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Kant: Philosophy of Mind

Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) was one of the most important philosophers of the Enlightenment Period (c. 1650-1800) in Western European history. This encyclopedia article focuses on Kant’s views in the philosophy of mind, which undergird much of his epistemology and metaphysics. In particular, it focuses on metaphysical and epistemological doctrines forming the core of Kant’s mature philosophy, as presented in the Critique of Pure Reason (CPR) of 1781/87 and elsewhere.

There are certain aspects of Kant’s project in the CPR that should be very familiar to anyone versed in the debates of seventeenth century European philosophy. For example, Kant argues, like Locke and Hume before him, that the boundaries of substantive human knowledge stop at experience, and thus that we must be extraordinarily circumspect concerning any claim made about what reality is like independent of all possible human experience. But, like Descartes and Leibniz, Kant thinks that central parts of human knowledge nevertheless exhibit characteristics of necessity and universality, and that, contrary to Hume’s skeptical arguments, there is good reason to think so.

Kant carries out a ‘critique’ of pure reason in order to show its nature and limits, thereby curbing the pretensions of various metaphysical systems articulated on the basis that reason alone allows us to scrutinize the depths of reality. But Kant also argues that the legitimate domain of reason is more extensive and more substantive than previous empiricist critiques had allowed. In this way Kant salvages (or attempts to) much of the prevailing Enlightenment conception of reason as an organ for knowledge of the world.

This article discusses Kant’s theory of cognition, including his views of the various mental faculties that make cognition possible. It distinguishes between different conceptions of consciousness at the basis of this theory of cognition and explains and discusses Kant’s criticisms of the prevailing rationalist conception of mind, popular in Germany at the time.

Kant’s Theory of Cognition
1. Mental Faculties and Mental Representation
  1. Sensibility, Understanding, and Reason
  2. Imagination and Judgment
2. Mental Processing
Consciousness
Concepts and Perception
Rational Psychology and Self-Knowledge
Summary
References and Further Reading
1. Kant’s Works in English
2. Secondary Sources

1. Kant’s Theory of Cognition

Kant is primarily interested in investigating the mind for epistemological reasons. One of the goals of his mature “critical” philosophy is articulating the conditions under which our scientific knowledge, including mathematics and natural science, is possible. Achieving this goal requires, in Kant’s estimation, a critique of the manner in which rational beings like ourselves gain such knowledge, so that we might distinguish those forms of inquiry that are legitimate, such as natural science, from those that are illegitimate, such as rationalist metaphysics. This critique proceeds via an examination of those features of the mind relevant to the acquisition of knowledge. This examination amounts to a survey of the conditions for “cognition” [Erkenntnis], or the mind’s relation to an object. Although there is some controversy about the best way to understand Kant’s use of this term, this article will understand it as involving relation to a possible object of experience, and as being a necessary condition for positive substantive knowledge (Wissen). Thus to understand Kant’s critical philosophy, we need to understand his conception of the mind.

a. Mental Faculties and Mental Representation

Kant characterizes the mind along two fundamental axes – first by the various kinds of powers which it possesses and second by the results of exercising those powers.

At the most basic explanatory level, Kant conceives of the mind as constituted by two fundamental capacities [Fähigkeiten], or powers, which he labels “receptivity” [Receptivität] and “spontaneity” [Spontaneität]. Receptivity, as the name suggests, constitutes the mind’s capacity to be affected by something, whether itself or something else. In other words, the mind’s receptive power essentially requires some external prompt to engage in producing “representations” [Vorstellungen], which are best thought of as discrete mental events or states, of which the mind is aware, or in virtue of which the mind is aware of something else (it is controversial whether representations are objects of ultimate awareness or are merely a vehicle for such awareness). In contrast, the power of spontaneity needs no such prompt. It is able to initiate its activity from itself, without any external trigger.

These two capacities of the mind are the basis for all (human) mental behavior. Kant thus construes all mental activity either in terms of its resulting from affection (receptivity) or from the mind’s self-prompted activity (spontaneity). From these two very general aspects of the mind Kant then derives three further basic faculties or “powers” [Vermögen], termed by Kant “sensibility” [Sinnlichkeit], “understanding” [Verstand], and “reason” [Vernunft]. These faculties characterize specific cognitive powers. These powers cannot be reduced to any of the others, and each is assigned a particular, cognitive task.

i. Sensibility, Understanding, and Reason

Kant distinguishes the three fundamental mental faculties from one another in two ways. First, he construes sensibility as the specific manner in which human beings, as well as other animals, are receptive. This is in contrast with the faculties of understanding and reason, which are forms of human, or all rational beings, spontaneity. Second, Kant distinguishes the faculties by their output. All of the mental faculties produce representations. We can see these distinctions at work in what is generally called the “stepladder” [Stufenleiter] passage from the Transcendental Dialectic of Kant’s major work, the Critique of Pure Reason (1781/7). This is one of the few places in the entire Kantian corpus where Kant explicitly discusses the meanings of and relations between his technical terms, and defines and classifies varieties of representation.

The genus is representation (representatio) in general. Under it stand representations with consciousness (perceptio). A perception [Wahrnehmung], that relates solely to a subject as a modification of its state, is sensation (sensatio). An objective perception is cognition (cognitio). This is either intuition or concept (intuitus vel conceptus). The first relates immediately to the object and is singular; the second is mediate, conveyed by a mark, which can be common to many things. A concept is either an empirical or a pure concept, and the pure concept, insofar as it has its origin solely in the understanding (not in a pure image of sensibility), is called notio. A concept made up of notions, which goes beyond the possibility of experience, is an idea or a concept of reason. (A320/B376–7).

As Kant’s discussion here indicates, the category of representation contains sensations [Empfindungen], intuitions [Anschauungen], and concepts [Begriffe]. Sensibility is the faculty that provides sensory representations. Sensibility generates representations based on being affected either by entities distinct from the subject or by the subject herself. This is in contrast to the faculty of understanding, which generates conceptual representations spontaneously – i.e. without advertence to affection. Reason is that spontaneous faculty by which special sorts of concepts, which Kant calls ‘ideas’ or ‘notions’, may be generated, and whose objects could never be met with in “experience,” which Kant defines as perceptions connected by fundamental concepts. Some of reason’s ideas include those concerning God and the soul.

Kant claims that all the representations generated via sensibility are structured by two “forms” of intuition—space and time—and that all sensory aspects of our experience are their “matter” (A20/B34). The simplest way of understanding what Kant means by “form” here is that anything one might experience will have either have spatial features, such as extension, shape, and location, or temporal features, such as being successive or simultaneous. So the formal element of an empirical intuition, or sense perception, will always be either spatial or temporal. Meanwhile, the material element is always sensory (in the sense of determining the phenomenal or “what it is like” character of experience) and tied either to one or more of the five senses or the feelings of pleasure and displeasure.

Kant ties the two forms of intuition to two distinct spheres or domains, the “inner” and the “outer.” The domain of outer intuition concerns the spatial world of material objects while the domain of inner intuition concerns temporally ordered states of mind. Space is thus the form of “outer sense” while time is the form of “inner sense” (A22/B37; cf. An 7:154). In the Transcendental Aesthetic, Kant is primarily concerned with “pure” [rein] intuition, or intuition absent any sensation, and often only speaks in passing of the sense perception of physical bodies (for example A20–1/B35). However, Kant more clearly links the five senses with intuition in his 1798 work Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View, in the section entitled “On the Five Senses.”

Sensibility in the cognitive faculty (the faculty of intuitive representations) contains two parts: sense and the imagination…But the senses, on the other hand, are divided into outer and inner sense (sensus internus); the first is where the human body is affected by physical things, the second is where the human body is affected by the mind (An 7:153).

Kant characterizes intuition generally in terms of two characteristics—namely immediacy [Unmittelbarkeit] and particularity [Einzelheit] (cf. A19/B33, A68/B93; JL 9:91). This is in contrast to the mediacy and generality [Allgemeinheit] characteristic of conceptual representation (A68/B93; JL 9:91).

Kant contrasts the particularity of intuition with the generality of concepts in the “stepladder” passage. Specifically, Kant says a concept is related to its object via “a mark, which can be common to many things” (A320/B377). This suggests that intuition, in contrast to concepts, puts a subject in cognitive contact with features of an object that are unique to particular objects and are not had by other objects. Some debate whether the immediacy of intuition is compatible with an intuition’s relating to an object by means of marks, or whether relation by means of marks entails mediacy and, thus, that only concepts relate to objects by means of marks. See Smit (2000) for discussion. Spatio-temporal properties seem like excellent candidates for such features, as no two objects of experience can have the very same spatio-temporal location (B327-8). But perhaps any non-repeatable, non-universal feature of a perceived object will do. For relevant discussion see Smith (2000); Grüne (2009), 50, 66-70.

Though Kant’s discussion of intuition suggests that it is a form of perceptual experience, this might seem to clash with his distinction between “experience” [Erfahrung] and “intuition” [Anschauung]. In part, this is a terminological issue. Kant’s notion of an “experience” is typically quite a bit narrower than our contemporary English usage of the term. Kant actually equates, at several points, “experience” with “empirical cognition” (B166, A176/B218, A189/B234), which is incompatible with experience being falsidical in any way. He also gives indications that experience, in his sense, is not something had by a single subject. See, for example, his claim that there is only one experience (A230/B282-3).

Kant also distinguishes intuition from “perception” [Wahrnehmung], which he characterizes as the conscious apprehension of the content of an intuition (Pr 4:300; cf. A99, A119-20, B162, and B202-3). “Experience,” in Kant’s sense, is then construed as a set of perceptions that are connected via fundamental concepts that Kant entitles the “categories.” As he puts it, “Experience is cognition through connected perceptions [durch verknüpfte Wahrnehmungen]” (B161; cf. B218; Pr 4:300).

Empirical intuition, perception, and experience, in Kant’s usage of these terms, all denote kinds of “experience” as we use the term in contemporary English. At its most primitive level, empirical intuition presents some feature of the world to the mind in a sensory manner. Empirical intuition does so in such a way that the intuition’s subject is in a position to distinguish that feature from others. A perception, in Kant’s sense, requires awareness of the basis by which the feature is different from other things. Kant uses the term in a variety of ways, however—JL 9:64-5, for instance—so there is some controversy surrounding the proper understanding of this term. One has a perception, in Kant’s sense, when one can not only discriminate one thing from another, or between the parts of a single thing, based on a sensory apprehension of it, but also can articulate exactly which features of the object or objects that distinguish it from others. For instance, one can say it is green rather than red, or that it occupies this spatial location rather than that one. Intuition thus allows for the discrimination of distinct objects via an awareness of their features, while perception allows for an awareness of what specifically distinguishes an object from others. “Experience,” in Kant’s sense, is even further up the cognitive ladder (see JL 9:64-5), insofar as it indicates an awareness of features, such as the substantiality of a thing, its causal relations with other beings, and its mereological features, that is part-whole dependence relations.

Kant thus believes that the capacity to cognitively ascend from mere discriminatory awareness of one’s environment (intuition), to an awareness of those features by means of which one discriminates (perception), and finally to an awareness of the objects which ground these features (experience), depends on the kinds of mental processes of which the subject is capable.

Before turning to the issue of mental processing, which figures centrally in Kant’s overall critical project, there are two further faculties of the mind that are worth discussion— the faculties of judgment imagination. These faculties are not obviously as fundamental as the faculties of sensibility, understanding, and reason, but they nevertheless play a central role in Kant’s thinking about the structure of the mind and its contributions to our experience of the world.

ii. Imagination and Judgment

Kant links the faculty of imagination closely to sensibility. For example, in his Anthropology he says,

Sensibility in the cognitive faculty (the faculty of intuitive representations) contains two parts: sense and the power of imagination. The first is the faculty of intuition in the presence of an object, the second is intuition even without the presence of an object. (An 7:153; cf. 7:167; B151; LM 29:881; LM 28:449, 673)

The contrast Kant makes here is not entirely obvious, but includes at least the difference between cases of occurrent sensory experience of a perceived object—seeing the brown table before you—and cases of sensory recollection of a previously perceived object—visually imagining the brown table that was once in front of you. Kant makes this clearer in the process of further distinguishing between different kinds of imagination.

The power of imagination (facultas imaginandi), as a faculty of intuition without the presence of the object, is either productive, that is, a faculty of the original presentation [Darstellung] of the object (exhibitio originaria), which thus precedes experience; or reproductive, a faculty of the derivative presentation of the object (exhibitio derivativa), which brings back to mind an empirical intuition that it had previously (An 7:167).

So, in the operation of productive imagination, one brings to mind a sensory experience that is not itself based on any object previously so experienced. This is not to say the productive imagination is totally creative. Kant explicitly denies (An 7:167) that the productive imagination has the power to generate wholly novel sensory experience. It could not, in a person born blind, produce the phenomenal quality associated with the experience of seeing a red object, for example. If the productive imagination is instrumental in producing sensory fictions, the reproductive imagination is instrumental in producing sensory experiences of previously perceived objects.

Imagination thus plays a central role in empirical cognition by serving as the basis for both memory and the creative arts. In addition it also plays a kind of mediating role between the faculties of sensibility and understanding. Kant calls this mediating role a “transcendental function” of the imagination (A124). It mediates and transcends by being tied in its functioning to both faculties. On one hand, it produces sensible representations, and is thus connected to sensibility. On the other hand, it is not a purely passive faculty but rather engages in the activity of bringing together various representations, as does memory, for example, .Kant explicitly connects understanding with this kind of active mental processing.

Kant also goes so far as to claim that the activity of imagination is a necessary part of what makes perception, in his technical sense of a string of connected, conscious sensory experiences, possible (A120, note). Though Kant’s view concerning the exact role of imagination in sensory experience is contested, two points emerge as central. First, Kant belives imagination plays a crucial role in the generation of complex sensory representations of an object (see Sellars (1978) for an influential example of this interpretation). It is imagination that makes it possible to have a sensory experience of a complex, three-dimensional, and geometric figure whose identity remains constant even as it is subject to translations and rotations in space. Second, Kant regards imagination’s mediating role between sensibility and understanding as crucial for at least some kinds of concept application (see Guyer (1987) and Pendlebury (1995) for further discussion). This mediating role involves what Kant calls the “schematization” of a concept and an additional mental faculty, that of judgment.

Kant defines the faculty of judgment as “the capacity to subsume under rules, that is, to distinguish whether something falls under a given rule” (A132/B171). However, he spends comparatively little time discussing this faculty in the first Critique. There, it seems to be discussed as an extension of the understanding in that it applies concepts to empirical objects. It is not until the third Critique—Kant’s 1790 Critique of Judgment—that Kant distinguishes judgment as an independent faculty with a special role. There Kant specifies two different ways it might function (CJ 5:179; cf. CJ (First Introduction) 20:211)

In one, judgment subsumes given objects under concepts, which are themselves already given. This role appears identical to the role he assigns judgment in the Critique of Pure Reason. The basic idea is that judgment functions to assign an intuited object—a dog—to the correct concept—such as domestic animals. This concept is presumed to be one already possessed by the subject. In this activity, the faculty overlaps with the role Kant singles out for imagination in the section of the first Critique entitled ‘On the Schematism of the Pure Concepts of the Understanding.’ Both are conceived of here in terms of the ultimate functioning of understanding, since it is understanding that generates concepts.

The second role for the faculty of judgment, and what seems to make it a distinctive faculty in its own right, is that of finding a concept under which to “subsume” experienced objects. This is called judgment’s “reflecting” role (CJ 5:179). Here, the subject exercises judgment in generating an appropriate concept for what is given by intuition (CJ (First Introduction) 20:211-13; JL 9:94–95; for discussion see Longuenesse (1998), 163–166 and 195–197; Ginsborg (2006).

In addition to the generation of empirical concepts, Kant also describes reflective judgment as responsible for scientific inquiry. It must sort and classify objects in nature into a hierarchical taxonomy of genus/species relationships. Kant also utilizes the notion of reflective judgment to unify the otherwise seemingly unrelated topics of the Critique of Judgment—aesthetic judgments and teleological judgments concerning the order of nature.

Thus far, the discussion of Kant’s view of the mind has focused primarily on the various mental faculties and their corresponding representational output. Both the faculty of imagination and that of judgment operate on representations given from sensibility and understanding. In general, Kant conceives of the mind’s activity in terms of different methods of “processing” representations.

b. Mental Processing

Kant’s term for mental processing is “combination” [Verbindung], and the form of combination with which he is primarily concerned is what he calls “synthesis.” Kant characterizes synthesis as that activity by which understanding “runs through” and “gathers together” representations given to it by sensibility in order to form concepts, judgments, and ultimately, for any cognition to take place at all (A77-8/B102-3). Synthesis is not something people are typically aware of doing. As Kant says, it is a “a blind though indispensable function of the soul…of which we are only seldom even conscious (A78/B103)”.

Synthesis is carried out by the unitary subject of representation upon representations either given to the subject by sensibility or produced by the subject through thought. Intellectual synthesis occurs when synthesis is used on representations and forms the content of a concept or judgment. When carried out by the imagination on material provided by sensibility, it is called “figurative” synthesis (B150-1). In the Critique of Pure Reason, Kant is primarily concerned with synthesis performed on representations provided by sensibility, and he discusses three central kinds of synthesis—apprehension, reproduction (or imagination), and recognition (or conceptualization) (A98-110/B159-61). Though Kant discusses these forms of synthesis as if they were discrete types of mental acts, it seems that the first two forms must occur together, while the third only may occur as well (compare Brook (1997); Allais (2009).

One of the central topics of debate in the interpretation of Kant’s views on synthesis is whether Kant endorses conceptualism. Roughly, conceptualism claims the capacity for conscious sensory experience of the objective world depends, at least in part, on the repertoire of concepts possessed by the experiencing subject, insofar as those concepts are exercised in acts of synthesis by understanding.

Kant typically contrasts synthesis with other ways in which representations might be related, most importantly, by association (for example B139-40). Association is primarily a passive process by which the mind comes to connect representations due to repeated exposure of the subject to certain kinds of regularities. One might, for example, associate thoughts of chicken soup with thoughts of being ill, if one only had chicken soup when one was ill. In contrast, synthesis is a fundamentally active process that depends upon the mind’s spontaneity and is the means by which genuine judgment is possible.

Consider, for example, the difference between the merely associative transition between holding a stone and feeling its weight compared to the judgment that the stone is heavy (B142). The association of holding the stone and feeling its weight is not yet a judgment about the stone, but a kind of involuntary connection between two states of oneself. In contrast, thinking the stone is heavy moves beyond associating two feelings to a thought about how things are objectively, independent of one’s own mental states (Pereboom (1995), Pereboom (2006)). One of Kant’s most important points concerning mental processing is that association cannot explain the possibility of objective judgment. What is required, he says, is a theory of mental processing by an active subject capable of acts of synthesis.

Several of the important differences between synthesis and association can be summarized as follows (Pereboom (1995), 4-7):

The source of synthesis is to be found in a subject, and the subject is distinct from its states.
Synthesis can employ a priori concepts, concepts independent of experience, as modes of processing representations, whereas association never does.
Synthesis is the product of a causally active subject. It is produced by a cause that is realized in the subject’s faculty, either the imagination or the understanding.

Kant’s conception of synthesis and judgment is tied to his conception of “consciousness” [Bewußtsein] and “self-consciousness” [Selbstbewußtsein]. However, both notions require some significant unpacking.

2. Consciousness

The notion of consciousness [Bewußtsein] plays an important role in Kant’s philosophy. There are, however, several different senses of “consciousness” in play in Kant’s work, not all of which line up with contemporary philosophical usage. Below, several of Kant’s most central notions and their differences from and relations to contemporary usage are explained.

a. Phenomenal Consciousness

Philosophical discussions of consciousness typically focus on phenomenal consciousness, or “what it is like” to have a conscious experience of a particular kind, such as seeing the color red or smelling a rose. Such qualitative features of consciousness have been of major concern to philosophers of the late 20th Century. However, the metaphysical issue of phenomenal consciousness is almost entirely ignored by Kant, perhaps because he is unconcerned with problems stemming from commitments to naturalism or physicalism. He seems to attribute all qualitative characteristics of consciousness to sensation and what he calls “feeling” [Gefühl] (CJ 5:206). Kant distinguishes between sensation and feeling in terms of an objective/subjective distinction. Sensations indicate or present features of objects, distinct from the subject. Feelings, by contrast, present only states of the subject to consciousness. Kant’s typical examples of such feelings include pain and pleasure (B66-7; CJ 5:189, 203-6).

Kant clearly assigns a cognitive role to sensation and allows that it is “through sensation” that we cognitively relate to objects given in sensibility (A20/B34). Despite that, he does not focus in any substantive or systematic way on the phenomenal aspects of sensory consciousness, nor does he focus on how exactly they aid in cognition of the empirical world.

b. Discrimination and Differentiation

The central notion of “consciousness” with which Kant is concerned is that of discrimination or differentiation. This is the same conception of consciousness mostly used in Kant’s time, particularly by his major predecessors Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716) and Christian Wolff (1679-1754), and Kant gives little indication that he departs from their general practice.

According to Kant, any time a subject can discriminate one thing from another, the subject is, or can be, conscious of that one thing. (An 7:136-8). Representations which allow for discrimination and differentiation are “clear” [klar]. Representations which allow not only for the differentiation of one thing from others (such as differentiating one person’s face from another’s), but also the differentiation of parts of the thing so discriminated (such as differentiating the different parts of a person’s face) are called “distinct” [deutlich].

Kant does seem to deny the Leibniz-Wolff tradition that clarity can simply be equated with consciousness (B414-15, note). Primarily, he seems motivated to allow that one’s discriminatory capacities may outrun one’s capacity for memory or even the explicit articulation of that which is discriminated. In such cases, one does not have a fully clear representation.

Kant’s conception of “obscure” [dunkel] representation is that it allows the subject to discriminate differentially between aspects of her environment without any explicit awareness of how she does so. This connects him with the Leibniz-Wolff tradition of recognizing the existence of unconscious representations (An 7:135-7). Kant says the majority of representations that people appeal to in order to explain the complex, discriminatory behaviors of living organisms are “obscure” in a technical sense. Likening the mind to a map Kant goes so far as to say,

The field of sensuous intuitions and sensations of which we are not conscious, even though we can undoubtedly conclude that we have them; that is, obscure representations in the human being (and thus also in animals), is immense. Clear representations, on the other hand, contain only infinitely few points of this field which lie open to consciousness; so that as it were only a few places on the vast map of our mind are illuminated. (An 7:135)

Thus, obscure representations, have no direct or non-inferential awareness but must be posited to explain our fine-grained, differential, and discriminatory capacities. They constitute the majority of the mental representations with which the mind busies itself.

Though Kant does not make it explicit in his discussion of discrimination and consciousness, it is clear that he takes the capacity to discriminate between objects and parts of objects to be ultimately based on sensory representation of those objects. His views on consciousness as differential discrimination intersect with his views on phenomenal consciousness. Because humans are receptive through their sensibility, the ultimate basis on which we differentially discriminate between objects must be sensory. Thus, though Kant seems to take for granted the fact that conscious beings are in states with a particular phenomenal character, it must be the clarity and distinctness of this character that allows a conscious subject to differentially discriminate between the various elements of her environment (see Kant’s discussion of aesthetic perfection in the 1801 Jäsche Logic, 9:33-9 for relevant discussion).

c. Self-Consciousness

As the discussion of unconscious representation indicates, Kant believes we are not directly aware of most of our representations. They are nevertheless, to some degree, conscious, because they allow differential discrimination of elements from the subject’s environment. Kant thinks the process of making a representation clear, or fully conscious, requires a higher-order representation of the relevant representation. In other words, it requires that someone can have representations based on representations. As Kant says, “consciousness is really the representation that another representation is in me” (JL 9:33). Because this higher-order representation is one of another representation in the subject, Kant’s position here suggests that consciousness requires at least the capacity for self-consciousness. This position is reinforced by Kant’s famous claim in the Transcendental Deduction of the Critique of Pure Reason:

The I think must be able to accompany all my representations; for otherwise something would be represented in me that could not be thought at all, which is as much as to say that the representation would either be impossible or else at least would be nothing for me. (B131-2; emphasis in the original)

Kant might give the impression here of saying that for representation to be possible for a subject, the subject must possess the capacity for self-ascribing her representations. If so, then representation, and thus the capacity for conscious representation would depend on the capacity for self-consciousness. Because Kant ties the capacity for self-consciousness to spontaneity (B132, 137, 423) and restricts spontaneity to the class of rational beings, the demand for self-ascription would seem to deny that any non-rational animal (for example, dogs, cats, and birds), could have phenomenal or discriminatory consciousness.

However, there is little evidence to show that Kant endorses the self-ascription condition. Instead, he distinguishes between two distinct modes in which one is aware of oneself and one’s representations—inner sense and apperception (See Ameriks (2000) for extensive discussion). Only the latter form of awareness seems to demand a capacity for self-ascription.

i. Inner Sense

Inner sense is, according to Kant, the means by which we are aware of alterations in our own state. Hence all moods, feelings, and sensations, including such basic alterations as pleasure and pain, are the proper subject matter of inner sense. Ultimately, Kant argues that all sensations, feelings, and those representations attributable to a subject must ultimately occur in inner sense and conform to its form—time (A22-3/B37; A34/B51).

Thus, to be aware of something in inner sense is to be minimally, phenomenally conscious, at least in the case of awareness of sensations and feelings. To say a subject is aware of her own states via inner sense is to say that she has a temporally ordered series of mental states, and is phenomenally conscious of each, though she may not be conscious of the series as a whole. This could still count as a kind of self-awareness, as when an animal is aware of being in pain. But it is not an awareness of subject as a self. Kant himself indicates such a position in a letter to his friend and former student Marcus Herz in 1789.

[Representations] could still (I consider myself as an animal) carry on their play in an orderly fashion, as connected according to empirical laws of association, and thus they could even have influence on my feeling and desire, without my being aware of my own existence [meines Daseins unbewußt] (assuming that I am even conscious of each individual representation, but not of their relation to the unity of representation of their object, by means of the synthetic unity of their apperception). This might be so without my cognizing the slightest thing thereby, not even what my own condition is (C 11:52, May 26, 1789).

Hence, according to Kant, one may be aware of one’s representations via inner sense, but one is not and cannot, through inner sense alone, be aware of oneself as the subject of those representations. That requires what Kant, following Leibniz (1996), calls “apperception”.

ii. Apperception

Kant uses the term “apperception” to denote the capacity for the awareness of some state or modification of one’s self as a state. For one capable of apperception, there is a difference between feeling pain, and thus having an inner sense of it, and apperceiving that one is in pain, and thus ascribing, or being able to ascribe, a certain property or state of mind to one’s self. For example, while a non-apperceptive animal is aware of its own pain and its awareness is partially explanatory of its behavior, like avoidance, Kant construes the animal as incapable of making any self-attribution of its pain. Kant thinks of such a mind as incapable of construing itself as a subject of states, and it is thus unable to construe itself as persisting through changes of those states. This is not necessarily to say an animal incapable of apperception lacks any subject or self. But, at the very least, such an animal would be incapable of conceiving or representing itself in this way (See Naragon (1990); McLear (2011).

Kant considers the capacity for apperception as importantly tied to the capacity to represent objects as complexes of properties attributable to a single underlying entity (for example, an apple as a subject of the complex of the properties red and round). Kant’s argument for this connection is notorious both for its complexity and for its obscurity. The next sub-section will give an overview, though not an exhaustive discussion, of some of Kant’s most important points concerning these matters, as they relate to the issue of apperception.

d. Unity of Consciousness and the Categories

In order to better understand Kant’s views on apperception and unity of consciousness, one must step back and look at the wider context of the argument in which he situates these views. One of the core projects of Kant’s most famous work, the Critique of Pure Reason, is to provide an argument for the legitimacy of a priori knowledge of the natural world. Though Kant’s conception of the a priori is complex, Kant shares one central aspect of his view with his German rationalist predecessors (for example Leibniz (1996), preface), that we have knowledge of universal and necessary truths concerning aspects of the empirical world (B4-5). Those truths include one saying every event in the empirical world has a cause (B231). This tradition tended to explain the possession of knowledge of such universal and necessary truths by appeal to innate concepts which could be analyzed to yield the relevant truths. Kant importantly departs from the rationalist tradition, arguing that not all knowledge of universal and necessary truths is acquired via the analysis of concepts (B14-18). Instead, he says there are some “synthetic” a priori truths that are known on the basis of something other than conceptual analysis. Thus, according to Kant, the activity of pure reason achieves relatively little on its own. All of our ampliative knowledge (knowledge that can’t be directly deduced) that is also necessary and universal consists in what Kant calls “synthetic a priori” judgments or propositions. He then pursues the central question: how is knowledge of such synthetic a priori propositions possible?

Kant’s basic answer to the question of synthetic a priori knowledge involves what he calls the “Copernican Turn.” According to the “Copernican Turn,” the objects of human knowledge must “conform” to the basic faculties of human knowledge—the forms of intuition (space and time) and the forms of thought (the categories).

Kant thus engages in a two-part strategy for explaining the possibility of such synthetic a priori knowledge. The first part consists of arguing that the pure forms of intuition provide the basis for our synthetic a priori knowledge of mathematical truths. Mathematical knowledge is synthetic because it goes beyond mere conceptual analysis to deal with the structure of, or our representation of, space itself. It is a priori because the structure of space is accessible to us as it is merely the form of our intuition and not a real mind-independent thing.

In addition to the representation of space and time, Kant also thinks that possession of a particular, privileged set of a priori concepts is necessary for knowledge of the empirical world. But this raises a problem. How can an a priori concept, which is not itself derived from any particular experience, be nevertheless legitimately applicable to objects of experience? Even more difficult, it is not the mere possibility applying a priori concepts to objects of experience that worries Kant, for this could just be a matter of pure luck. Kant wants more than mere possibility; he wants to show that a privileged set of a priori concepts apply necessarily and universally to all objects of experience and do so in a way that people can know independently of experience.

This brings us to the second part of Kant’s argument, which is directly relevant for understanding Kant’s views on the importance of apperception. Not only must objects of knowledge conform to the forms of intuition, they also must conform to the most basic concepts (or categories) governing our capacity for thought. Kant’s strategy shows how a priori concepts legitimately apply to their objects by being partly constitutive of the objects of representation. This contrasts with the traditional view, according to which the objects of representation were the source or explanatory ground of our concepts (B, xvii-xix). Now, exactly what this means is deeply contested, in part because it is rather unclear what Kant intends by his doctrine of Transcendental Idealism. Does Kant intend that the objects of representation are themselves nothing other than representations? This would be a form of phenomenalism similar to that offered by Berkeley. Kant, however, seems to want to deny that his view is similar to Berkeley’s, asserting instead that the objects of representation exist independently of the mind, and that it is only the way that they are represented that is mind-dependent (A92/B125; compare Pr 4:288-94).

Kant’s strategy attempts to validate the legitimacy of the a priori categories proceeds by way of a “transcendental argument.” It takes the conditions necessary for consciousness of the identity of oneself as the subject of different self-attributed mental states and ties them together with those necessary for grounding the possibility of representing an object distinct from oneself. From those conditions, various properties may be predicated. In this sense, Kant argues that the intellectual representation of subject and object stands and falls together. Kant thus denies the possibility of a self-conscious subject, who could conceptualize and self-ascribe her representations, but whose representations could not represent law-governed objects in space, and thus the material world or ‘nature’ as the subject conceives of it.

Though Kant’s views regarding the unity of the subject are contested, there are several points which can be made fairly clearly. First, Kant conceives of all specific, intellectual activity, including the most basic instances of discursive thought, as requiring what he calls the “original unity of apperception” (B132). This unity, as original, is not itself brought about by some mental act of combining representations, but, as Kant says, is “what makes the concept of combination possible” (B131). It is itself the ground of the “possibility of the understanding” (B131).

Second, the original unity of apperception requires whatever form of self-consciousness characteristically relates to the “I think.” As Kant famously says, “the I think must be able to accompany all my representations” (B131). Moreover, the “I think” essentially involves activity on the part of the subject—it is an expression of the subject’s free activity or “spontaneity” (B132). This means that, according to Kant, only beings capable of spontaneous activity—self-initiated activity that is ultimately traced to causes outside the reach of natural causal laws—are going to be capable of thought in the sense with which Kant is concerned.

Third, and related to the previous point, Kant seems to deny that a subject could attain the kind of representational unity characteristic of thought if her only resources were aggregative methods. Kant makes this point later in the Critique when he says, “representations that are distributed among different beings (for instance, the individual words of a verse) never constitute a whole thought (a verse)” (A 352). William James provides a vivid articulation of the idea: “Take a sentence of a dozen words, and take twelve men and tell to each one word. Then stand the men in a row or jam them in a bunch, and let each think of his word as intently as he will; nowhere will there be a consciousness of the whole sentence” (James (1890), 160). Kant construes consciousness as the “holding-together” of the various components of a thought. He does so in a manner that seems radically opposed to any conception of unitary thought which tries to explain it in terms of some train or succession of its components (Pr 4:304; see Kitcher (2010); Engstrom (2013) for contrasting treatments of this issue).

The exact content of Kant’s argument for the connection between subject and object in the Transcendental Deduction is highly disputed, and it is likely no single reconstruction of the argument can capture all the points Kant supports in the Deduction. At least one strand of Kant’s argument in the first half of the Deduction focuses on Kant’s denial that the unity of the subject and its powers of representational combination could be accounted for by a merely associationist (or Humean) conception of mental combination, sometimes termed his “argument from above” (see A119; Carl (1989); Pereboom (1995)). Kant’s argues (see Pereboom (2009)):

I am conscious of the identity of myself as the subject of different self-attributions of mental states.
I am not directly conscious of the identity of this subject of different self-attributions of mental states.
If (1) and (2) are true, then this consciousness of identity is accounted for indirectly by my consciousness of a particular kind of unity of my mental states.
Therefore, this consciousness of identity is accounted for indirectly by my consciousness of a particular kind of unity of my mental states. (1, 2, 3)
If (4) is true, then my mental states indeed have this particular kind of unity.
This particular kind of unity of my mental states cannot be accounted for by association. (5)
If (6) is true, then this particular kind of unity of my mental states is accounted for by synthesis by a priori
Therefore, this particular kind of unity of my mental states is accounted for by synthesis by a priori concepts. (6, 7)

Premise (1) says that I am aware of herself as the subject of different states (or at least able to be so aware). For example, right now I might be hungry as well as sleepy. Previously, I was sleepy and slightly bored. Premise (2) claims I have no immediate or direct awareness of the being which has all of these states. In Kant’s terms, I lack any intuition of the subject of such self-ascribed states, instead having intuition only of the states themselves. Nevertheless, I am aware of all these states as related to a subject (it is I who am bored, hungry, sleepy), and it is in virtue of these connections that I can call one and all of these states mine. Hence, as premise (3) argues, there must be some unity to my mental states which accounts for my (indirect) awareness of their unity. My representations must have some basis for which they go together, and it is the basis for their ‘togetherness’ that explains how I can consider them, one and all, to be mine. Premises (4) and (5) unpack this point, and premise (6) argues that association could not account for such unity (the theory of association was articulated in a particularly influential form by David Hume (1888, Hume (2007)) and the reader should look to that article for relevant background discussion).

Kant’s point, in premise (6) of the above argument, is that forces of association acting on mental representations, whether impressions or ideas, cannot account for either the experience of a train of representations as mine or for the “togetherness” of those representations, both as a single thought or as a series of inferences. Hume argues we have no impression and thus no ensuing idea of an empirical self (Hume (1888), I.iv.6). Kant also accepts this point when he says, “the empirical consciousness that accompanies different representations is by itself dispersed and without relation to the identity of the subject” (B133). By this, Kant means that when we introspect in inner sense, all we ever get are particular mental states, such as boredom, happiness, particular thoughts. We lack any intuition of a subject of those mental states. Hume concludes that the idea of a persisting self which grounds all of these mental states as its subject must be fictitious. Kant disagrees. His contrasting view takes the mineness and togetherness of one’s introspectible mental states as data needing explanation.Because an associative, psychological theory like that of Hume’s cannot explain these features of first-person consciousness (see Hume (1888), III. Appendix), we need to find another theory, such as Kant’s theory of mental synthesis.

Recall that, prior to the argument of the Transcendental Deduction, Kant links the operations of synthesis to possession of a set of a priori concepts, or categories, not derived from experience. Hence, in arguing that synthesis is required to explain the mineness and togetherness of one’s mental states, and by linking synthesis to the application of the categories, Kant argues we could not have the experience of the mineness and togetherness of our mental states without applying the categories.

While this argument is only half of Kant’s argument in the first part of the Deduction, it shows how tightly Kant took the connection to be between the capacities for spontaneity, synthesis and apperception, and the legitimacy of the categories. The other half, by the way, consists of an “argument from below,” and discerns the conditions necessary for the representation of unitary objects, see Pereboom (1995), (2009)According to Kant, there is only one possible explanation of one’s apperceptive awareness of one’s psychological states as one’s own and of all states being related to one another. As the subject of such states, one possesses a spontaneous power for synthesizing one’s representations according to general principles or rules, the content of which is given by pure a priori concepts—the categories. The fact that the categories play such a fundamental role in the generation of self-conscious psychological states is thus a powerful argument demonstrating their legitimacy.

Given that Kant leverages certain aspects of our capacity for self-knowledge in his argument for the legitimacy of the categories, the extent to which he argues for radical limits on our capacity for self-knowledge may be surprising. In the final section, Kant’s arguments concerning our capacity for a priori knowledge of the self and its fundamental features will be made clear. However, the next section will look at one of the central debates in Kant’s interpretation of the role of concepts in perceptual experience.

3. Concepts and Perception

During the discussion of synthesis above, conceptualism was characterized as claiming there is a dependent relation between a subject having conscious sensory experience of an objective world and the repertoire of concepts possessed by the subject and exercised by her faculty of understanding.

As a first pass at sharpening this formulation, understand conceptualism as a thesis consisting of two claims: (i) sense experience has correctness conditions determined by the ‘content’ of the experience, and (ii) the content of an experience is a structured entity whose components are concepts.

a. Content and Correctness

An important background assumption governing the conceptualism debate construes mental states as related to the world cognitively, as opposed to merely causally, if and only if they possess correctness conditions. That which determines the correctness condition for a state is that state’s content (see Siegel (2010), (2011); Schellenberg (2011)).

Suppose, for example, that an experience E has the following content C:

C: That cup is white.

This content determines a correctness condition V:

V: S’s experience E is correct if and only if the cup visually presented to the subject as the content of the demonstrative is white and the content C corresponds to how things seem to the subject to be visually presented.

Here, the content of the experiential state functions much like the content of a belief state to determine whether the experience, like the belief, is or is not correct.

A state’s possession of content thus determines a correctness condition, through which the state can be construed as mapping, mirroring, or otherwise tracking aspects of the subject’s environment.

There are reasons for questioning whether Kant endorses the content assumption articulated above. Kant seems to deny several claims integral to it. First, in various places he explicitly denies that intuition, or the deliverances of the senses more generally, are the kind of thing which could be correct or incorrect (A293–4/B350; An §11 7:146; compare LL 24:83ff, 103, 720ff, 825ff). Second, Kant’s conception of representational content requires an act of mental unification (Pr 4:304; compare JL §17 9:101; LL 24:928), something which Kant explicitly denies is present in an intuition (B129-30; compare B176-7). This is not to deny that Kant uses a notion of “content,” in some other sense, but rather only that he fails to use it in the sense required by interpretations endorsing the content assumption (see Tolley (2014), (2013)). Finally, Kant’s “modal” condition of cognition, that it provides a demonstration of what is really actual rather than merely logically possible, seems to preclude an endorsement of the content assumption (B, xxvii, note; compare Chignell (2014)). However, for the purposes of understanding the conceptualism debate, assume Kant does endorse the content assumption. The question then is how to understand the nature of the content so understood.

b. Conceptual Content

In addition to the content assumption, conceptualism is defined as committed to a conception of intuition’s content being completely composed of concepts. Against this, Clinton Tolley (Tolley (2013), Tolley (2014)) has argued that the immediacy/mediacy distinction between intuition and concept entails a difference in the content of intuition and concept.

If we understand by ‘content’…a representation’s particular relation to an object…then it is clear that we should conclude that Kant accepts non-conceptual content. This is because Kant accepts that intuitions put us in a representational relation to objects that is distinct in kind from the relation that pertains to concepts. I argued, furthermore, that this is the meaning that Kant himself assigns to the term ‘content’. (Tolley (2013), 128)

Insofar as Kant often speaks of the ‘content’ [Inhalt] of a representation as consisting of a particular kind of relation to an object (Tolley (2013), 112; compare B83, B87), Tolley’s proposal thus gives ground for a simple and straightforward argument for a non-conceptualist reading of Kant. However, it does not necessarily prove that the content of what Kant calls an intuition is not something that would be construed by others as conceptual, in a wider sense of that term. For example, both pure—that, this—and complex demonstrative expressions—that color, this person—have conceptual form, and have been proposed as appropriate for capturing the content of experience (McDowell (1996), ch. 3; for discussion see Heck (2000)). Demonstratives are not, in Kant’s terms, ‘conceptual’ since they do not exhibit the requisite generality which, according to Kant, all conceptual representation must.

c. Conceptualism and Synthesis

If it isn’t textually plausible to understand the content of an intuition in conceptual terms, at least as Kant understands the notion of a concept, then what would it mean to say that Kant endorses conceptualism with regard to experience? The most plausible interpretation, endorsed by a wide variety of interpreters, reads Kant as arguing that the generation of an intuition, whether pure or sensory, depends at least in part on the activity of the understanding. On this way of carving things, conceptualism does not consist in the narrow claim that intuitions have concepts as contents or components. Instead, it consists in the broader claim that the occurrence of an intuition depends at least in part on the discursive activity of understanding. The specific activity of understanding is that which Kant calls ‘synthesis,’ the “running through, and gathering together” of representations (A99).

The conceptualist further argues that taking intuitions as generated via acts of synthesis, which are directed by or otherwise dependent upon conceptual capacities, provides some basis for the claim that whatever correctness conditions might be had by intuition must accord with the conceptual synthesis which generated them. This arguably fits well with Kant’s much quoted claim,

The same function that gives unity to the different representations in a judgment also gives unity to the mere synthesis of different representations in an intuition, which, expressed generally, is called the pure concept of understanding. (A79/B104-5)

The link between intuition, synthesis in accordance with concepts, and relation to an object is made even clearer by Kant’s claim in §17 of the B-edition Transcendental Deduction:

Understanding is, generally speaking, the faculty of cognitions. These consist in the determinate relation of given representations to an object. An object, however, is that in the concept of which the manifold of a given intuition is united. (B137; emphasis in the original)

However else we are to understand this passage, Kant here indicates that the unity of an intuition necessary for it to stand as a cognition of an object requires a synthesis by the concept ”object.” In other words, cognition of an object requires that intuition be unified by an act or acts of the understanding.

According to the conceptualist interpretation, one must understand the notion of a representation’s content as a relation to an object, which in turn depends on a conceptually guided synthesis. So we can revise our initial definition of conceptualism to read it as claiming (i) the content of an intuition is a kind of relation to an object, (ii) the relation to an object depends on a synthesis directed in accordance with concepts, and (iii) synthesis in accordance with concepts sets correctness conditions for the intuition’s representation of a mind-independent object.

d. Objections to Conceptualism

At the heart of non-conceptualist readings of Kant stands denial that mental acts of synthesis carried out by understanding are necessary for the occurrence of cognitive mental states of the type which Kant designates by the term “intuition” [Anschauung]. Though it is controversial as to what might be considered the “natural” or “default” reading of Kant’s mature critical philosophy, there are at least four considerations which lend strong support to a non-conceptualist interpretation of Kant’s mature work.

First, Kant repeatedly and forcefully states that in cognition there is a strict division of cognitive labor—objects are given by sensibility and thought via understanding:

Objects are given to us by means of sensibility, and it alone yields us intuitions; they are thought through the understanding, and from the understanding arise concepts (A19/B33; compare A50/B74, A51/B75–6, A271/B327).

As Robert Hanna has argued, when Kant discusses the dependence of intuition on conceptual judgment in the Analytic of Concepts, he specifically talks about cognition rather than what others would consider to be perceptual experience (Hanna (2005), 265-7).

Second, Kant characterizes the representational capacities characteristic of sensibility as more primitive than those characteristic of understanding, or reason, and he characterizes those capacities as a plausible part of what humans share with the rest of the animal kingdom (Kant connects the possession of a faculty of sensibility to animal nature in various places, for example A546/B574, A802/B830; An 7:196). For example, Kant’s distinction between the faculties of sensibility and understanding seems intended to capture the difference between the “sub-rational” powers of the mind that is shared with non-human animals and the “rational or higher-level cognitive powers” that are special to human beings. (Hanna (2005), 249; compare Allais (2009); McLear (2011))

If one were to deny that, according to Kant, sensibility alone is capable of producing mental states cognitive in character, then, it would seem that any animal which lacks a faculty of understanding would thereby lack any capacity for genuinely perceptual experience. The mental lives of non-rational animals would thus, at best, consist of non-cognitive sensory states causally correlated with changes in the animal’s environment. Aside from an unappealing and implausible characterization of the animals’ cognitive capacities, this reading also faces textual hurdles (for relevant discussion of some of the issues in contemporary cognitive ethology see Bermúdez (2003); Lurz (2009); Andrews (2014), as well as the papers in Lurz (2011)). Kant is on record in various places as saying that animals have sensory representations of their environment (CPJ 5:464; LM 28:449; compare An 7:212), that they have intuitions (LL 24:702), and that they are acquainted with objects though they do not cognize them (JL 9:64–5) (see Naragon (1990); Allais (2009); McLear (2011)).

Hence, if Kant’s position is that synthetic acts carried out by the understanding are necessary for the cognitive standing of a mental state, then Kant is contradicting fundamental elements of his own position in crediting intuitions or their possibility to non-rational animals.

Third, any position which regards perceptual experience as dependent upon acts of synthesis carried out by the understanding would presumably also construe the ‘pure’ intuitions of space and time as dependent upon acts of synthesis (see Longuenesse (1998), ch. 9; Griffith (2012)). However, Kant’s discussion of space, and, analogously, time, in the third and fourth arguments (fourth and fifth in the case of time) of the Metaphysical Exposition of Space in the Transcendental Aesthetic seems incompatible with such a proposed relation of dependence.

Kant’s point in the third and fourth arguments of the Metaphysical Exposition of space and time is that no finite intellect could grasp the extent and nature of space as an infinite whole via a synthetic process involving movement from representation of a part to representation of the whole. If the unity of the forms of intuition were itself something dependent upon intellectual activity, then this unity would necessarily involve the discursive, though not necessarily conceptual, running through and gathering together of a given multiplicity (presumably of different locations or moments) into a combined whole. Kant believes this is characteristic of synthesis generally (A99).

But Kant’s arguments in the Metaphysical Expositions require the fundamental basis of the representation of space and time does not proceed from a grasp of the multiplicative features of an intuited particular to the whole with those features. Instead, the form of pure intuition constitutes a representational whole that is prior to that of its component parts (compare CJ 5:407-8, 409).

Hence, Kant’s position is that the pure intuitions of space and time possess a unity wholly different from that given by the discursive unity of understanding (whether in conceptual judgment or the intellectual with imaginative synthesis of intuited objects). The unity of aesthetic representation—characterized by forms of space and time—has a structure in which the representational parts depend upon the whole. The unity of discursive representation—representation where the activity of understanding is involved—has a structure in which the representational whole depends upon its parts (see McLear (2015)).

Finally, there has been extensive discussion on the non-conceptuality of intuition in the secondary literature on Kant’s philosophy of mathematics. For example, Michael Friedman has argued that the expressive limitations of prevailing logic in Kant’s time required the postulation of intuition as a form of singular, non-conceptual representation (Friedman (1992), ch. 2; Anderson (2005); Sutherland (2008)). In contrast to Friedman’s view, Charles Parsons and Emily Carson argued that the immediacy of intuition, both pure and empirical, should be construed in a ‘phenomenological’ manner. Space in particular is understood on their interpretation as an original, non-conceptual representation, which Kant takes to be necessary for the demonstration of the real possibility of constructed, mathematical objects as required for geometric knowledge (Parsons (1964); Parsons (1992); Carson (1997); Carson (1999); compare Hanna (2002). For a general overview of related issues in Kant’s philosophy of mathematics, see Shabel (2006) and the works cited therein at p. 107, note 29.)

Ultimately, however, there are difficulties assessing whether Kant’s philosophy of mathematics can have relevance for the conceptualism debate. It is not obvious whether intuition must be non-conceptual in accounting for mathematical knowledge is incompatible with claiming that intuitions themselves are dependent upon a conceptually-guided synthesis.

The non-conceptualist reading clearly commits to allowing that sensibility alone provides, perhaps in a very primitive manner, objective representation of the empirical world. Sensibility is construed as an independent cognitive faculty, which humans share with other non-rational animals, and which is the jumping-off point for more sophisticated, conceptual representation of empirical reality.

The next and final section looks at Kant’s views regarding the nature and limits of self-knowledge and the ramifications of this for traditional rationalist views of the self.

4. Rational Psychology and Self-Knowledge

Kant discusses the nature and limits of our self-knowledge most extensively in the first Critique, in a section of the Transcendental Dialectic called the “Paralogisms of Pure Reason.” Here, Kant is concerned to criticize the claims of what he calls “rational psychology.” Specifically, he is concerned about the claim that we can have substantive, metaphysical knowledge of the nature of the subject, based purely on an analysis of the concept of the thinking self. As Kant typically puts it:

I think is thus the sole text of rational psychology, from which it is to develop its entire wisdom…because the least empirical predicate would corrupt the rational purity and independence of the science from all experience. (A343/B401)

There are four “Paralogisms.” Each argument is presented as a syllogism, consisting of two premises and a conclusion. According to Kant, each argument is guilty of an equivocation on a term common to the premises, such that the argument is invalid. Kant’s aim, in his discussion of each Paralogism, is to diagnose the equivocation, and explain why the rational psychologist’s argument ultimately fails. In so doing, Kant provides a great deal of information about his own views concerning the mind (See Ameriks (2000) for extensive discussion). The argument of the first Paralogism concerns knowledge of the self as substance; the second, the simplicity of the self; the third, the numerical identity of the self; and the fourth, knowledge of the self versus knowledge of things in space.

a. Substantiality (A348-51/B410-11)

Kant presents the rationalist’s argument in the First Paralogism as follows:

What cannot be thought otherwise than as subject does not exist otherwise than as subject, and is therefore substance.
Now a thinking being, considered merely as such, cannot be thought of as other than a subject.
Therefore, a thinking being also exists only as such a thing, i.e., as substance.

Kant’s presentation of the argument is rather compressed. In more explicit form we can put it as follows (see Proops (2010)):

All entities that cannot be thought of as other than a subjects are entities that cannot exist otherwise than as subjects, and therefore are substances. (All M are P)
All entities that are thinking beings are entities that cannot be thought otherwise than as subjects. (All S are M)
Therefore, all entities that are thinking beings are entities that cannot exist otherwise than as subjects, and therefore are substances (All S are P)

The relevant equivocation is in the term that occupies the ‘M’ place in the argument— “entities that cannot be thought otherwise than as subjects”. Kant specifically locates the ambiguity in the use of the term “thought” [Das Denken], which he claims concerns an object in general in the first premise. Thus, “thought” could be given in a possible intuition. In the second premise, the use of “thought” is supposed to apply only to a feature of thought and, thus, not to an object of a possible intuition (B411-12).

While it isn’t obvious what Kant means by this claim, it could be that. Kant takes the first premise to make a claim about the objects of thought. They exist as an independent subject or bearer of properties and cannot be conceived of as anything else. This is thus a metaphysical claim about what kinds of objects could really exist, which explains Kant’s reference to an “object in general” that could be given in intuition.

In contrast, premise (2) makes a merely logical claim concerning the role of the representation in a possible judgment. Kant says one cannot use representation in any place other than upon the subject. For example, while I can make the claim “I am tall,” I would make no sense to claim “the tall is I.”

Against the rational psychologist, Kant argues that one cannot make any legitimate inference from the conditions under which representation may be thought, or employed in a judgment, to the status of the ‘I’ as a metaphysical subject of properties. Kant makes this point explicit when he says,

The first syllogism of transcendental psychology imposes on us an only allegedly new insight when it passes off the constant logical subject of thinking as the cognition of a real subject of inherence, with which we do not and cannot have the least acquaintance, because consciousness is the one single thing that makes all representations into thoughts, and in which, therefore, as in the transcendental subject, our perceptions must be encountered; and apart from this logical significance of the I, we have no acquaintance with the subject in itself that grounds this I as a substratum, just as it grounds all thoughts. (A350)

Kant thus argues that one should differentiate between different conceptions of “substance” and the role they play in thoughts concerning the world.

Substance₀:

x is a substance₀ if and only if the representation of x cannot be used as a predicate in a categorical judgment

Substance₁:

x is a substance₁ if and only if its existence is such that it can never inhere, or exist, in anything else (B288, 407)

The first conception of substance is merely logical or grammatical. The second conception is explicitly metaphysical. Finally, there is an even more metaphysically demanding usage of “substance” that Kant employs.

(Empirical) Substance₂:

x is a substance₂ if and only if it is a substance₁ that persists at every moment (A144/B183, A182)

According to Kant, the rational psychologist attempts to move from claims about substance₀ to the more robustly metaphysical claims characteristic of conceptions and uses of substance₁ and substance₂. However, without further substantive assumptions, which go beyond anything given in an analysis of the concept , no legitimate inference can be made from our notion of a substance₀ to either of the other conceptions of substance.

Because, Kant denies that humans have any intuition, empirical or otherwise, of themselves as subjects, they cannot come to have any knowledge concerning what we are in terms of beings either substance₁ or substance₂. At least they cannot do so by reflecting on the conditions of thinking of themselves using first-person concepts. No amount of introspection or reflection on the content of the first-person concept will yield such knowledge.

b. Simplicity (A351-61/B407-8)

Kant’s discussion of the proposed metaphysical simplicity of the subject largely depends on points he made in the previous Paralogism concerning its proposed substantiality. Kant articulates the Second Paralogism as follows:

The subject, whose action can never be regarded as the concurrence of many acting things, is simple. (All A is B)
The self is such a subject. (C is A)
Therefore, the self is simple. (C is B)

Here, the equivocation concerns the notion of a “subject.” Kant’s point, as with the previous Paralogism, is that, from the fact that one’s first-person representation of the self is always a grammatical or logical subject, nothing follows concerning the metaphysical status of that representation’s referent.

Of perhaps greater interest in this discussion of the Paralogism of simplicity is Kant’s analysis of what he calls the “Achilles of all dialectical inferences” (A351). According to the Achilles argument, the soul or mind is known to be a simple, unitary substance, because only such a substance could think unitary thoughts. Called the “unity claim” (see Brook (1997)), it says:

(UC):

If a multiplicity of representations are to form a single representation, they must be contained in the absolute unity of the thinking substance. (A352)

Against UC, Kant argues that there is no reason to think the structure of a thought, as a complex of representations, isn’t mirrored in the complex structure of an entity that thinks thoughts. UC is not analytic, which is to say that there is no contradiction entailed by its negation. UC also fails to be a synthetic a priori claim, in that it follows neither from the nature of intuition’s forms, nor from categories. Hence, UC could only be shown to be true empirically, and because people have no empirical intuition of the self, people have no basis for thinking that UC must be true (A353).

Kant here makes a point similar to contemporary, functionalist accounts of the mind (see Meerbote (1991); Brook (1997)). Mental functions, including the unity of conscious thought, are consistent with a variety of different media in which functions are realized. Kant’s says there is no contradiction in thinking that a plurality of substances might succeed in generating a single, unified thought. Hence, we cannot know that the mind is such that it must be simple in nature.

c. Numerical Identity (A361-66/B408)

Kant articulates the Third Paralogism as follows:

What is conscious of the numerical identity of its Self in different times, is, to that extent, a person. (All C is P)
Now, the soul is conscious of the numerical identity of its Self in different times. (S is C)
Therefore, the soul is a person. (S is P)

Rational psychologists’ interest in establishing the personality of the soul or mind stems from the importance of proving that not only would the mind persist after the destruction of its body, but also that this mind would be the same person as before, not just some sort of bare consciousness or worse (for example, existing only as a “bare monad”).

Kant here makes two main points. First, the rational psychologist cannot infer from the sameness of the first-person representation (the “I think”) or across applications of it in judgment to any conclusion concerning the sameness of the metaphysical subject referred to by that representation. Kant thus again makes a functionalist point. The medium in which a series of representational states inheres may change over time, and there is no contradiction in conceiving of a series of representations as being transferred from one substance to another (A363-4, note).

Second, Kant argues that we can be confident of the soul’s possession of personality by virtue of apperception’s persistence. The relevant notion of “personality” here distinguishes between a rational being and an animal. While the persistence of apperception (the persistence of the “I think” as being able to attach to all of one’s representations) does not provide an apperceiving subject with any insight into the true metaphysical nature of the mind, it does provide evidence of the soul’s possession of an understanding. Animals, by contrast, do not possess an understanding but, at best, according to Kant, only an analogue thereof. As Kant says in the Anthropology,@

That man can have the I among his representations elevates him infinitely above all other living beings on earth. He is thereby a person […] that is, by rank and worth a completely distinct being from things that are the same as reason-less animals with which one can do as one pleases. (An 7:127, §1)

Hence, so long as a soul possesses the capacity for apperception, it will signal the possession of an understanding, and thus serves to distinguish the human soul from that of an animal (see Dyck (2010), 120).

d. Relation to Objects in Space (A366-80/B409)

Finally, the Fourth Paralogism concerns the relation between awareness of one’s own mind and one’s awareness of other objects distinct from oneself. Thus, it also deals with one’s mind and awareness of space. Kant describes the Fourth Paralogism as follows:

What can be only causally inferred is never certain. (All I is not C)
The existence of outer objects can only be causally inferred, not immediately perceived by us. (O is I)
Therefore, we can never be certain of the existence of outer objects. (O is not C)

Kant locates the damaging ambiguity in the conception of “outer” objects. This is puzzling because it doesn’t play the relevant role as middle term in the syllogism. But Kant is quite clear that this is where the ambiguity lies and distinguishes between two distinct senses of the “outer” or “external”:

Trancendentally Outer/External:

A seperate existence, in and of itself.

Empirically Outer/External:

An existence in space.

Kant’s point here is that all appearances in space are empirically external to the subject who perceives or thinks about them, while nevertheless being transcendentally internal. Such spatial appearances do not have an entirely independent metaphysical nature, because their spatial features depend at least in part on our forms of intuition.

Kant then uses this distinction not only to argue against the assumption of the rational psychologist that the mind is better known than any object in space (famously argued by Descartes), but also against those forms of external world skepticism championed by Descartes and Berkeley. Kant identifies Berkeley with what he calls “dogmatic idealism” and Descartes with what he calls “problematic idealism” (A377). He defines them thus:

Problematic Idealism:

We cannot be certain of the existence of any material body.

Dogmatic Idealism:

We can be certain that no material body exists – the notion of a body is self-contradictory.

Kant brings two arguments to bear against the rational psychologist’s assumption about the immediacy of our self-knowledge, as well as these two forms of skepticism, with mixed results. The two arguments are from “immediacy” and “imagination.”

i. The Immediacy Argument

In an extended passage in the Fourth Paralogism (A370-1) Kant makes the following argument:

External objects (bodies) are merely appearances, hence also nothing other than a species of my representations, whose objects are something only through these representations, but are nothing separated from them. Thus external things exist as well as my self, and indeed both exist on the immediate testimony of my self-consciousness, only with this difference: the representation of my Self, as the thinking subject, is related merely to inner sense, but the representations that designate extended beings are also related to outer sense. I am no more necessitated to draw inferences in respect of the reality of external objects than I am in regard to the reality of the objects of my inner sense (my thoughts), for in both cases they are nothing but representations, the immediate perception (consciousness) of which is at the same time a sufficient proof of their reality. (A370-1)

It helps to understand the argument as follows:

Rational Psychology (RP) privileges awareness of the subject and its states over awareness of non-subjective states.
But, transcendental idealism entails that people are aware of both subjective and objective states, as they appear, in the same way—via a form of intuition.
So, either both kinds of awareness are immediate or they are both mediate.
Because awareness of subjective states is obviously immediate, then awareness of objective states must also be immediate.
Therefore, we are immediately aware of the states or properties of physical objects.

Here, Kant displays what he takes to be an advantage of Transcendental Idealism. Because both inner and outer sense depend on intuition, there is nothing special about inner intuition that privileges it over outer intuition. Both are, as intuitions, immediate presentations of objects, at least as they appear. Unfortunately, Kant never makes clear what he means by the term “immediate” [unmittelbar]. This issue is much contested (see Smit (2000)). At the very least, he means to signal that awareness in intuition is not mediated by any explicit or conscious inference, as when he says that the transcendental idealist “grants to matter, as appearance, a reality which need not be inferred, but is immediately perceived” (A371).

It is not obvious that an external world skeptic would find this argument convincing, as part of the grip of such skepticism relies on the convincing point that things could seem to one just as they currently are, even if there really is no external world causing one’s experiences. This may just beg the question against Kant (particularly premise (2) of the above argument). Certainly, Kant seems to think that his arguments for the existence of pure intuitions of space and time in the Transcendental Aesthetic lend some weight to his position. Thus, Kant is not so much arguing for Transcendental Idealism here as explaining some of the further benefits that come when the position is adopted. He does, however, present at least one further argument against the skeptical objection articulated above—the argument from imagination.

ii. The Argument from Imagination

Kant’s attempt to respond to the skeptical worry that things might appear to be outside us while not actually existing outside us appeals to the role imagination would have to play to make such a possibility plausible (A373-4; compare Anthropology, 7:167-8).

This material or real entity, however, this Something that is to be intuited in space, necessarily presupposes perception, and it cannot be invented by any power of imagination or produced independently of perception, which indicates the reality of something in space. Thus sensation is that which designates a reality in space and time, according to whether it is related to the one or the other mode of sensible intuition.

What follows is a reconstruction of this argument.

If problematic idealism is correct, then it is possible for one to have never perceived any spatial object but only to have imagined doing so.
But imagination cannot fabricate—it can only re-fabricate.
So, if one has sensory experience of outer spatial objects, then one must have had at least one successful perception of an external spatial object.
Therefore, it is certain that an extended spatial world exists.

Kant’s idea here is that the imagination is too limited to generate the various qualities that people experience as instantiated in external physical objects. Hence, it would not be possible to simply imagine an external physical world without having been originally exposed to the qualities instantiated in the physical world. Ergo, the physical world must exist. Even Descartes seems to agree with this, noting in Meditation I that “[certain simple kinds of qualities] are as it were the real colours from which we form all the images of things, whether true or false, that occur in our thought” (Descartes (1984), 13-14). Though Descartes goes on to doubt our capacity to know even such basic qualities given the possible existence of an evil deceiver, it is notable that the deceiver must be something other than ourselves, in order to account for all the richness and variety of what we experience (however, see Meditation VI (Descartes (1984), 54), where Descartes wonders whether there could be some hidden faculty in ourselves producing all of our ideas).

Unfortunately, it isn’t clear that the argument from imagination gets Kant the conclusion he wants, for all that it shows is that there was at one time a physical world, which affected one’s senses and provided the material for one’s sense experiences. This might be enough to show that one has not always been radically deceived, but it is not enough to show that one is not currently being radically deceived. Even worse, it isn’t even clear that a physical world must exist to generate the requisite material for the imagination. Perhaps all that is needed is something distinct from the subject, something which is capable of generating in it the requisite sensory experiences, whether or not they are veridical. This conclusion is thus compatible with that “something” being Descartes’s evil demon, or in contemporary epistemology, with the subject’s being a brain in a vat. Hence, it is not obvious that Kant’s argument succeeds in refuting the skeptic. To the extent that he did refute the skeptic, it still does not show that there is a physical world, as opposed merely to the existence of something distinct from the subject.

e. Lessons of the Paralogisms

Beyond the specific arguments of the Paralogisms and their conclusions, they present us with two central tenets of Kant’s conception of the mind. First, we cannot move from claims concerning the character or role of the first-person representation to claims concerning the nature of the referent of that representation. This is a key part of his criticism of rational psychology. Second, people do not have privileged access to themselves as compared with things outside them. Both the self (or its states) and external objects are on par with respect to intuition. This also means that they only have access to themselves as they appear, and not as they fundamentally, metaphysically, are (compare B157). Hence, according to Kant, self-awareness, just as much as awareness of anything distinct from the self, is conditioned by sensibility. Intellectual access to selves in apperception, Kant argues, does not reveal anything about one’s metaphysical nature, in the sense of the kind of thing that must exist to realize the various cognitive powers that Kant describes as characteristic of a being capable of apperception—a spontaneous understanding or intellect.

5. Summary

Kant’s conception of the mind, his distinction between sensory and intellectual faculties, his functionalism, his conception of mental content, and his work on the nature of the subject/object distinction, were all hugely influential. His work immediately inspired the German Idealist movement. He also became central to emerging ideas concerning the epistemology of science in the late 19^th and early 20^th centuries, in what became known as the “Neo-Kantian” movement in central and southern Germany. Though Anglophone interest in Kant ebbed somewhat in the early 20^th century, his conception of the mind and criticisms of rationalist psychology were again influential mid-century via the work of “analytic” Kantians such as P.F. Strawson, Jonathan Bennett, and Wilfrid Sellars. In the early 21^st century Kant’s work on the mind remains a touchstone for philosophical investigation, especially in the work of those influenced by Strawson or Sellars, such as Quassim Cassam, John McDowell, and Christopher Peacocke.

6. References and Further Reading

Quotations from Kant’s work are from the German edition of Kant’s works, the Akademie Ausgabe, with the first Critique cited by the standard A/B edition pagination, and the other works by volume and page. English translations belong to the author of this article article, though he has regularly consulted, and in most cases closely followed, translations from the Cambridge Editions. Specific texts are abbreviated as follows:

An: Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View
C: Correspondence
CPR: Critique of Pure Reason
CJ: Critique of Judgment
JL: Jäsche Logic
LA: Lectures on Anthropology
LL: Lecturs on Logic
LM: Lectures on Metaphysics
Pr: Prolegomena to any Future Metaphysics

a. Kant’s Works in English

The most used scholarly English translations of Kant’s work are published by Cambridge University Press as the Cambridge Editions of the Works of Immanuel Kant. The following are from that collection and contain some of Kant’s most important and influential writings.

Correspondence, ed. Arnulf Zweig. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Critique of Pure Reason, trans. Paul Guyer and Allen Wood. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Critique of the Power of Judgment, trans. Paul Guyer and Eric Matthews. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
History, Anthropology, and Education, eds. Günter Zöller and Robert Louden. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
Lectures on Anthropology, ed. and trans. Allen W. Wood and Robert B. Louden. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012.
Lectures on Logic, trans. J. Michael Young. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
Lectures on Metaphysics, ed. and trans. Karl Ameriks and Steve Naragon. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Practical Philosophy, ed. Mary Gregor. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Theoretical Philosophy 1755-1770, ed. David Walford. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
Theoretical Philosophy after 1781, eds. Henry Allison and Peter Heath. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002

b. Secondary Sources

Allais, Lucy. 2009. “Kant, Non-Conceptual Content and the Representation of Space.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 47 (3): 383–413.
Allison, Henry E. 2004. Kant’s Transcendental Idealism: Revised and Enlarged. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Ameriks, Karl. 2000. Kant and the Fate of Autonomy: Problems in the Appropriation of the Critical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Anderson, R Lanier. 2005. “Neo-Kantianism and the Roots of Anti-Psychologism.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 13 (2): 287–323.
Andrews, Kristin. 2014. The Animal Mind: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Animal Cognition. London: Routledge.
Bennett, Jonathan. 1966. Kant’s Analytic. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Bennett, Jonathan. 1974. Kant’s Dialectic. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Bermúdez, José Luis. 2003. “Ascribing Thoughts to Non-Linguistic Creatures.” Facta Philosophica 5 (2): 313–34.
Brook, Andrew. 1997. Kant and the Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Buroker, Jill Vance. 2006. Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason: An Introduction. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Carl, Wolfgang. 1989. “Kant’s First Drafts of the Deduction of the Categories.” In Kant’s Transcendental Deductions, edited by Eckart Förster, 3–20. Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Carson, Emily. 1997. “Kant on Intuition and Geometry.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 27 (4): 489–512.
Carson, Emily. 1999. “Kant on the Method of Mathematics.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 37 (4): 629–52.
Caygill, Howard. 1995. A Kant Dictionary. Vol. 121. London: Blackwell.
Chignell, Andrew. 2014. “Modal Motivations for Noumenal Ignorance: Knowledge, Cognition, and Coherence.” Kant-Studien 105 (4): 573–97.
Descartes, Rene. 1984. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. Edited by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch. Vol. 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Dicker, Georges. 2004. Kant’s Theory of Knowledge : An Analytical Introduction. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Dyck, Corey W. 2010. “The Aeneas Argument: Personality and Immortality in Kant’s Third Paralogism.” In Kant Yearbook, edited by Dietmar Heidemann, 95–122.
Engstrom, Stephen. 2013. “Unity of Apperception.” Studi Kantiani 26: 37–54.
Friedman, Michael. 1992. Kant and the Exact Sciences. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Gardner, Sebastian. 1999. Kant and the Critique of Pure Reason. London: Routledge.
Ginsborg, Hannah. 2006. “Kant and the Problem of Experience.” Philosophical Topics 34 (1 and 2): 59–106.
Griffith, Aaron M. 2012. “Perception and the Categories: A Conceptualist Reading of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason.” European Journal of Philosophy 20 (2): 193–222.
Grüne, Stefanie. 2009. Blinde Anschauung. Vittorio Klostermann.
Guyer, Paul. 1987. Kant and the Claims of Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Guyer, Paul. 2014. Kant. London: Routledge.
Hanna, Robert. 2002. “Mathematics for Humans: Kant’s Philosophy of Arithmetic Revisited.” European Journal of Philosophy 10 (3): 328–52.
Hanne, Robert. 2005. “Kant and Nonconceptual Content.” European Journal of Philosophy 13 (2): 247–90.
Heck, Richard G. 2000. “Nonconceptual Content and the ‘Space of Reasons’.” The Philosophical Review 109 (4): 483–523.
Hume, David. 1888. A Treatise of Human Nature. Edited by L A Selby-Bigge. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Hume, David. 2007. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Peter Millican. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
James, William. 1890. The Principles of Psychology. New York: Holt.
Keller, Pierre. 1998. Kant and the Demands of Self-Consciousness. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kitcher, Patricia. 1993. Kant’s Transcendental Psychology. New York: Oxford University Press.
Kitcher, Patricia. 2010. Kant’s Thinker. New York: Oxford University Press.
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm Freiherr. 1996. New Essays on Human Understanding. Edited by Jonathan Bennett and Peter Remnant. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Longuenesse, Béatrice. 1998. Kant and the Capacity to Judge. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Lurz, Robert W. 2011. Mindreading Animals: The Debate over What Animals Know About Other Minds. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Lurz, Robert W., ed. 2009. The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
McDowell, John. 1996. Mind and World: With a New Introduction. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
McLear, Colin. 2011. “Kant on Animal Consciousness.” Philosophers’ Imprint 11 (15): 1–16.
McLear, Colin. 2015. “Two Kinds of Unity in the Critique of Pure Reason.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 53 (1): 79–110.
Meerbote, Ralf. 1991. “Kant’s Functionalism.” In Historical Foundations of Cognitive Science, edited by J-C Smith, 161–87. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Naragon, Steve. 1990. “Kant on Descartes and the Brutes.” Kant-Studien 81 (1): 1–23.
Parsons, Charles. 1964. “Infinity and Kant’s Conception of the ‘Possibility of Experience’.” The Philosophical Review 73 (2): 182–97.
Parsons, Charles. 1992. “The Transcendental Aesthetic.” In The Cambridge Companion to Kant, edited by Paul Guyer, 62–100. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Paton, H J. 1936. Kant’s Metaphysic of Experience. Vol. 1 & 2. London: G. Allen & Unwin, Ltd.
Pendlebury, Michael. 1995. “Making Sense of Kant’s Schematism.” PPR 55 (4): 777–97.
Pereboom, Derk. 1995. “Determinism Al Dente.” Noûs 29: 21–45.
Pereboom, Derk. 2006. “Kant’s Metaphysical and Transcendental Deductions.” In A Companion to Kant, edited by Graham Bird, 154–68. Blackwell Publishing.
Pereboom, Derk. 2009. “Kant’s Transcendental Arguments.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
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Schellenberg, S. 2011. “Perceptual Content Defended.” Noûs 45 (4): 714–50.
Sellars, Wilfrid. 1956. “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind.” Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science 1: 253–329.
Sellars, Wilfrid. 1968. Science and Metaphysics: Variations on Kantian Themes. London: Routledge & Keegan Paul.
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Author Information

Colin McLear
Email: mclear@unl.edu
University of Nebraska
U. S. A.

Lucius Annaeus Seneca (c. 4 B.C.E.—65 C.E.)

The ancient Roman philosopher Seneca was a Stoic who adopted and argued largely from within the framework he inherited from his Stoic predecessors. His Letters to Lucilius have long been widely read Stoic texts. Seneca’s texts have many aims: he writes to exhort readers to philosophy, to encourage them to continue study, to articulate his philosophical position, to defend Stoicism against opponents, to portray a philosophical life, and much more. Seneca also writes to criticize the social practices and values of his fellow Romans. He rejects and criticizes, among other things, the idea that death is an evil, that wealth is a good, that political power is valuable, that anger is justified. In Seneca’s philosophical texts, one finds a Stoic who attempts to live in accordance with the conclusions he reaches through philosophy. Though Seneca admits to falling short of this goal personally, his efforts have long been one of the attractions (though some have found these to be distractions) of his philosophical works.

Lucius Annaeus Seneca was born in Cordoba during the reign of Augustus. Because of his birth to a provincial nobleman of low rank, Seneca was quite removed from the workings of the powerful Roman elite, yet the course of his life would come to be shaped by his relationships—sometimes inimical, sometimes friendly—with the early Julio-Claudian Emperors. He was exiled by Claudius and then recalled. He was friend and tutor to Nero. This relationship itself eventually soured, and Seneca, under orders from Nero, committed suicide in 65 C.E.

Someone familiar with Seneca exclusively as a philosopher is likely to be shocked by the details of his personal life. How, one may wonder, should Seneca’s argument that poverty is not an evil be understood in light of the fact that Seneca was one of the wealthiest men in the world? And how should Seneca’s commitment to and claims about the value of living philosophically be understood in light of the fact that Seneca’s own life was riddled with controversy and intrigue? On the other hand, one familiar with Seneca’s life may well meet with wonder the philosophical positions to be found in his philosophical works. How, one may ask, could the person who had positioned himself as the advisor to the young and impressionable (ex hypothesi) Princeps of Rome be the same person who upholds the private life as superior to the public? How could a man whose life story seems impossible for any but the most flexible character be the author of texts upholding the value of integrity and self-mastery as against mastery by one’s circumstances? These and many other questions make a clear view of Seneca difficult. This article attempts to provide a general sense of Seneca’s life and works that can serve as a starting point for understanding Seneca’s legacy. The aim here is primarily to bring the difficulties into view, rather than to resolve them.

Life, Political Career, and Death
Works and Thought
References and Further Reading
1. Texts and Translations
2. Secondary Literature

1. Life, Political Career, and Death

Although the general outline of Seneca’s life is known, that many details remain unknown is surprising given both Seneca’s fame during his lifetime and the volume of his writing. On many points of detail about his life, scholars must take into consideration the available sources, some of which are from centuries after Seneca’s death and others which are hostile to his writings, and reconstruct a plausible account. Seneca’s birth is one of many such examples. Seneca was born in Cordoba, Spain. His father, Seneca the Elder, was a member of the Roman nobility whose family had immigrated to Spain. Seneca spent his earliest years with his mother Helvia at the family estates in Cordoba while his father was away in Rome. We do not know with certainty the year of Seneca’s birth, but the evidence from Seneca’s scant references to his own life suggest that he was born no earlier than 8 B.C.E. and no later than 1 B.C.E. Though some uncertainty is inescapable unless new evidence is discovered, the most common estimate for his birth is 4 B.C.E.

Seneca’s father, also Lucius Annaeus Seneca (the Elder), was a Roman nobleman of the equestrian class. The Elder’s enthusiasm for Roman politics and his enthusiasm for his two older sons’ potential in Roman society are plain in his Controversiae. Also plain is his insistence that the path for his middle son, our Seneca, was to be the normal cursus honorum (course of offices) and not the life of philosophical study. Seneca the Younger thus came to Rome very early, likely by age 5, to begin his training for Roman public life. Seneca’s early education is likely to have been typical of Roman elites at the time—focusing on language (both Greek and Latin) and traditional texts. Though his father would have been eligible for certain Roman offices, he seems instead to have devoted himself to forwarding the careers of his two oldest sons, Annaeus Novatus (later named Gallio upon adoption by L. Junius Gallio) and our Seneca. The Elder Seneca did not pressure his youngest son, Marcus Annaeus Mela, eventual father of Lucan, to pursue a political career.

Little is known with certainty about Seneca’s early life, particularly his personal life. Seneca presents himself in his philosophical works in a way that conceals personal details, however, in some cases, those he gives can provide helpful insight. His references, for example, to his former teachers—Attalus the Stoic, Fabianus the Sextian, and others—give some indication of his advanced training in philosophy and rhetoric. Scholars have found these references to his training, though sparse, crucial for understanding Seneca’s particular philosophical approach. Seneca does not, however, say enough about his personal experiences in Rome to help scholars in developing a robust biography. Further complicating matters is the fact that while Seneca is mentioned in histories from the ancient world, including those of Tacitus and Cassius Dio and the biographies of Suetonius, Seneca’s life as a whole is nowhere a topic of sustained focus.

We know that Seneca’s political career had a slow beginning. By the time Gaius (Calligula) Caesar died in 41 C.E., Seneca (now roughly 45 years old) had not yet advanced to the rank of Praetor, a rank for which he would have been eligible many years earlier. Seneca’s delayed progress or delayed entrance into the cursus honorum has been a matter of much research and speculation and has been explained by one or more of the following: Seneca’s recurring bouts of poor health, because of which he is thought to have spent a number of years in Egypt; his increasing interest in a philosophical, rather than public, life; his emerging reputation as a rhetorical talent; the tumultuous political environment during the time from Sejanus’ rise and fall until the ascension of Claudius in 41. Whatever the explanation, and whatever Seneca’s political ambitions may have been, they were stalled when, in 41, he was exiled by Claudius to the island of Corsica, where he would remain until 49.

Although Seneca’s guilt is not clearly attested in our sources, he was charged and convicted before the Senate for committing adultery with Julia Livilla, the sister of Gaius Caesar. Seneca tells us in the Consolation to Polybius (13.2) that he had been convicted and sentenced to death by the Senate but that Claudius had spared his life. Claudius’ intervention, perhaps, along with some other uncertainties about the case, suggest that the case against Seneca was, despite the Senate’s ruling, not decisive. The historian Cassius Dio (60.8.4, and Griffin, 32) argues that Seneca was essentially a casualty in an attempt by Messalina, Claudius’ wife, to be rid of Julia Livilla. On the other hand, Seneca was clearly a friend of Julia’s family. Her sister, Agrippina the Younger, would later be instrumental in reviving Seneca’s political career. Whatever the case, the occasion of Seneca’s exile marks the beginning of his involvement with the imperial family, which guides the course of his life thereafter.

Seneca’s exile ended with the help of Agrippina the Younger, now wife of Claudius, in 49 C.E. Upon Seneca’s return to Rome, he became the tutor of Agrippina’s son, the young Nero. Seneca’s role in Roman politics after his recall in 49 was largely unconventional. He was at first known as the ‘tutor’ (magister) of Nero and later became (along with Burrus) an influential advisor and speech-writer. In our records he is variously referred to as Nero’s ‘friend’ (amicus) and tutor. Neither of these titles had historically been associated with much political power, but it seems that Seneca likely played an important role in governing Rome, at least in the early years of Nero’s rule. It is difficult to know just which actions were taken on Seneca’s advice and which were not, though some ancient sources credit Seneca with the good policies and blame Burrus for the bad ones. Whatever the details of Seneca’s contribution, the first five years of Nero’s reign—the ‘quinquennium Neronis‘—have been noted for their successes. Here again, though, historians are divided on whether the successes of the first five years of Nero’s reign were genuine or merely successes in public relations, for which Seneca would have been well suited. As Nero matured, though, he began to rely less and less on Seneca’s advice. Eventually, Seneca was named as an associate in the failed Pisonian Conspiracy to overthrow Nero. In 65 C.E., Seneca was sentenced by Nero to commit suicide.

The circumstances of Seneca’s death are reported at length in Tacitus’ Annals (XV.60 ff.) and with less detail by both Cassius Dio and Seutonius. Indeed, Seneca’s death has been a topic of great intrigue and disagreement. Upon receiving word of his sentence, Seneca is reported to have acted calmly. He cut his wrists and legs to let his blood drain, but this proved ineffective because of his frail condition. He then took hemlock, which was also ineffective because of his poor circulation. He was then placed in a bath to improve his circulation and finally suffocated from the steam. As he had specified in his will, he was cremated without ceremony.

The setting and circumstances of Seneca’s death serve as a window into the difficulties of understanding the relation between his life and philosophical work. On the one hand his death seems to be modeled on that of Socrates in Plato’s Phaedo. His last moments are tranquil. He is described as being calm upon receiving the judgment of Nero and then meeting his death, which was, it seems, was preceded by dinner and conversation with his wife, Paulina, and friends. During the ordeal itself, he attempts to calm his friends by telling them to follow the “imago” (“pattern” or “image”) of his life. Seneca here likely means the image of a philosophical life that he has crafted in his works. But that picture of his life does not always fit comfortably with the rest of what we learn from our sources. Tacitus’ account of his death illustrates this. For while Seneca’s demeanor and actions remind us of Socrates’ death, the life that precedes this end bears little similarity to Socrates’. Seneca seems to have crafted a philosophical death, but in a context of great political intrigue. Whereas Socrates dies, at least partly, for his refusal to become involved in Athenian political affairs, Seneca dies, also at least partly, for the failure of his political maneuvers. Seneca seems to have known the sentence of death was coming. He may well have been involved, as alleged, in the Pisonian conspiracy. After his account of Seneca’s death, Tacitus reports a rumor that after the assassination of Nero, Piso was also to be put to death, and Seneca installed as princeps. Tacitus reports that Seneca is rumored to have known of this plan.

2. Works and Thought

Despite Seneca’s turbulent political career, he managed to produce and publish a great deal. His most famous and widely read works are his Letters to Lucilius. The Letters contain much that is of interest to students of Stoicism in general and have served for many as an entry point into Stoic philosophy. The Letters also show something of how Seneca thought philosophical principles could shape how one lives. In addition to the Letters, many other philosophical works—collected under the title ‘Dialogi’—survive. These treatises, some of which are incomplete, include three Consolations (Consolation to Marcia, Consolation to Helvia, Consolation to Polybius) and philosophical treatises on specific questions, topics, or themes (On Anger, On Mercy, On Leisure, On the Constancy of the Wise Person, On Providence, On Benefits). Seneca’s extended work, the Natural Questions, investigates various meteorological phenomena from the point of view of Stoic natural philosophy. In addition to his philosophical works, eight of Seneca’s tragedies survive along with a work that satirizes the deification of Claudius (The Apocoloycyntosis or ‘Pumpkinification’ of Claudius). It is known that Seneca wrote many other works that have been lost, including the public speeches that he wrote for Nero.

a. Seneca and Stoicism

Seneca’s philosophical outlook is best understood in terms of his particular circumstances. He, like many Roman philosophers of his time, was more interested in moral philosophy than in the other two branches of philosophy (dialectic, or logic, and physics) that had become standard in Hellenistic thinking about the parts of philosophy. While Seneca is clearly well-trained and widely read in all parts of philosophy, he chooses to focus on moral philosophy in his texts. With the exception of the Natural Questions, which is devoted entirely to the branch of philosophy called ‘physics’ (a branch that included natural philosophy as well as theology), much of Seneca’s work focuses on ethical matters. Also like other philosophers of his time, Seneca’s focus in moral philosophy has a clear practical emphasis. While discussions of theory and theoretical controversies abound in Seneca’s Letters and other works, his focus is consistently on how his theory—Stoicism—can be brought to bear on living one’s life. Seneca emphasizes the importance of this in Letter 89, where he encourages Lucilius (the addressee of the Letters) to indulge his wish to study logic so long has he refers everything that he learns to living a good life.

Seneca clearly sees himself as a Stoic. He commonly refers to the Stoic school as ‘ours’ and does much to defend the Stoics against certain Peripatetic and Epicurean attacks. Still, he is willing to disagree with the Stoics about certain matters in which he thinks a clearer or better argument is available. In Letter 33, for example, Seneca claims that he follows the teachings of the Stoics, but points out that the people who have discovered important truths in the past are not his masters (domini), but rather his guides (duces). Elsewhere, in his On Leisure, Seneca makes a similar point that he accepts the views of Zeno and Chrysippus (two early leaders of the Stoa) not just because Zeno or Chrysippus taught them, but because the arguments themselves lead to those positions.

He is also willing to make some concessions to the main adversary—the Epicurean. Seneca’s stance, especially toward Epicurus, has led readers to think that Seneca is best described as ‘eclectic’ rather than Stoic. His willingness to draw upon the philosophy of Epicurus, Plato, and others has seemed to some to betray the softness of his commitment to Stoicism. Seneca’s reply to this charge can be found in the passages from Letter 33 and On Leisure above. His focus is on the truth. He believes that, in some cases, the Epicurean or the Aristotelian has hit upon the truth. He is happy to acknowledge this to Lucilius and his readers but is nonetheless ready to point out that they have arrived at the truth for the wrong reasons. His treatise On Leisure illustrates this point. The question is whether the wise person ought to engage in public life or instead retire to pursue the work of retirement, which includes philosophical study. The Epicurean view is that the wise person will not engage in public life unless something interferes. The Stoic view is that the wise person will engage in public life unless something interferes. Seneca, though, argues that the importance of the projects of one’s private life (including the study of philosophy) can, in fact, trump the requirement to enter public life, even according to the Stoic view. This, he argues, shows that the pursuit of philosophical study and avoidance of public life are, in fact, recommended by the Stoics. The Epicureans’ overt call to avoid public life is mistaken, Seneca argues, because it assumes that a life devoted to politics cannot be harmonious with the philosophical life. Seneca concedes that in the actual world, as it is now, that is true, but points out that circumstances can change. In a world where public service would produce greater benefit to mankind than private, philosophical, work, a wise person would engage in the former.

Certain affinities between Seneca and his most famous fellow Roman philosophers—Marcus Aurelius and Epictetus – are commonly noted. All are concerned with the importance of living a philosophical life. All are, in the works that survive, more concerned with ethics than other branches of philosophy. These generalizations are accurate, but they obscure some features of Seneca’s philosophical works that distinguish him from these Roman Stoics. In particular, Seneca’s philosophical works were written for publication. In contrast, Epictetus did not write anything, and Marcus wrote for himself; Seneca, though, intended that his works be readthey were read widely during and after his lifetime.

A related and in some ways more significant feature of Seneca’s authorship is his decision not only to write for an audience, but to do so in Latin rather than Greek. In the generations both before and after Seneca, Greek remained the language of philosophical discourse. Two notable exceptions to this pattern are the Epicurean Lucretius’ epic poem De Rerum Natura (On the Nature of Things), and the philosophical works of Marcus Tullius Cicero. The efforts of Lucretius and Cicero to bring philosophy to Latin and to prove that Latin is sufficient for the task (a regular theme in Cicero’s works) largely failed. Seneca, however, does not seem to have had a goal of bringing philosophy to Latin. He has little interest, as Cicero did, in demonstrating that Latin could accommodate the Greek technical vocabulary. This has made Seneca’s texts particularly useless for those seeking to trace the history of particular terms or concepts through Classical and Hellenistic philosophy. On the other hand, Seneca’s approach makes it clear that he is not concerned with matters of concordance or with establishing or maintaining a particular paradigm of philosophical exposition. Seneca is, instead, doing philosophy in Latin (Inwood, 2005).

Though Seneca distinguishes himself from his peers in some respects, he nonetheless professes his allegiance to Stoicism. His commitment to the school can be seen most clearly in his frequent return to a number of core Stoic positions—particularly the positions defended in Stoic moral philosophy. The Stoic view of morality is distinguished from other Hellenistic and Classical philosophical schools by its commitment to the idea that an individual has absolute authority over her happiness. The Stoics reject the Aristotelian idea that one’s happiness (eudaimonia) is at least in part determined by things outside one’s control. Seneca stands with the Stoics in rejecting this view of happiness. He frequently returns to this theme in different contexts and emphasizes the importance of knowing what things are in one’s power and what things are not. Seneca agrees with the Stoics that virtue is sufficient for happiness. One’s virtue, unlike one’s circumstances, is within one’s power.

Knowledge of one’s nature is importantly connected, in Stoicism, with one’s knowledge of nature generally. Seneca often appeals to the importance of understanding nature in his works. He recommends, for example, that one who is setting off on a voyage say to himself that he will arrive at his destination unless something interferes. This statement is taken to reflect the understanding that whether one’s actions unfold as one wishes is not entirely within one’s control. Thus, Seneca urges that it would be a mistake to say “I will arrive at my destination.” Such a plan ignores the fact that many ships do not reach their destinations. The more one understands the nature of things, the more one understands what is in one’s power and what is not.

Indeed, the Stoics emphasize that to live well one must live according to nature. In Seneca’s texts, this emphasis provides the background for criticism of his culture and fellow Romans. To follow nature or live according to nature requires that one abandon many practices and values that have been taken up through acculturation. Seneca’s return throughout his philosophical writings to the dangers of public life, of crowds, and of social excesses relies on this point—that much of society is corrupt. To live as the mob supposes one should live is to stray from nature. Seneca notes, in Letter 46, that reason demands one live in accordance with one’s own nature, but this nature can be led astray.

b. Philosophical Substance and Literary Talent

Seneca’s literary talent was unmatched during his lifetime. His style appealed immediately to his Roman audience. Writing a generation after Seneca, Quintilian notes in his Institutiones that early in his career Seneca’s works were the only works being read. Quintilian’s treatment of Seneca’s texts is telling. In cataloguing the texts of other authors, he systematically omits Seneca’s contributions to each genre. Seneca’s works are given their own treatment because of their difficulty in being read judiciously. Quintilian praises Seneca’s works but recommends advanced training be completed prior to reading them.

With some modifications, this advice has been upheld by modern readers of Seneca. While he is often rated a philosophical amateur, no scholars would venture the similar claim about his literary talents. This realization, however, has led scholars of Seneca’s philosophical positions to take more care to understand the literary aims and constraints of his work. By all accounts, even from as early as Tacitus and Quitilian, Seneca’s prose style was both original and quite popular. His originality extends beyond the style of his sentences all the way to the organization of his philosophical treatises. He everywhere prefers a style of philosophical writing that more closely resembles conversation.

Seneca’s literary genius confronts readers of his text with a difficulty. Those interested in Seneca’s philosophy cannot simply ignore aspects of genre, style, and so on. For Seneca, these are importantly connected. Often the philosophical message of a treatise or letter is entangled with the norms of the genre in which he is working. At the same time, Seneca often presses against such norms to enlarge or bring into focus certain philosophical points. He claims, for example, that philosophical discourse can be appropriately undertaken as a conversation (Letter 75.1-2). To a great extent, Seneca’s philosophical texts reflect this preference: straightforward exposition is rare in his works. More frequently, his addressee is made to interrupt a point by asking a question or posing a challenge. In some cases, though, the demands of philosophical exposition require setting aside the genre’s norms. Seneca blames Lucilius, for example, in Letter 95 for its length and technical detail. This interplay between style and substance requires great care in interpreting Seneca’s philosophical achievements.

Seneca’s literary talents further complicate interpreting his philosophical works when one considers his controversial career. In some cases a careful interpretation of his work cannot ignore the immediate political context. The Apocolocyntosis, a scathing attack on Claudius, has clear political and public aims (though little of philosophical interest). His Consolation to Helvia, written to his mother during his exile, may well have been intended as a defense and request for recall. Similarly, he once mentions (Polybius 13.2) his trial and conviction, perhaps in an effort to remind Claudius of his innocence. These references to his own life, though rare, alert readers to the fact that his treatises may be constructed with many goals in mind: philosophical, but also personal, political, and literary. One can, for example, see the intermingling of aims in the opening passages of On Mercy, where Seneca praises Nero’s virtues. The praise of Nero’s character has both a philosophical and political goal: to encourage careful thinking about the importance, for a ruler, of cultivating mercy and to exhort the ruler of Rome to have mercy on those who may be thought to have wronged him.

c. The Letters to Lucilius

The Letters to Lucilius are Seneca’s most widely read and influential texts. The Letters contain much that is of interest to philosophers and to non-philosophers alike. 124 Letters have survived, divided into 20 books. It is likely that not all of the Letters have been preserved. The interpretation of Seneca’s Letters has been a matter of much disagreement among scholars.

The Letters themselves contain a wide variety of material ranging from apparently mundane discussions (for example, the dangers of crowds and public baths) to advanced technical discussions of Stoic theory. Seneca often makes use of something in everyday life to steer discussion to an ethical question or to some piece of moral advice. An over-arching interpretation of the Letters as a literary and philosophical work has eluded consensus among scholars. Still, a number of features of the Letters stand out as helpful for their interpretation. First, many groups of letters deal with common themes. Letters 5-10, for example, deal broadly with questions about living a philosophical life. Letters 94-5, the longest two letters of the work, deal with a technical question about the role of rules in moral reasoning. These are but two examples. There are few, if any, Letters the themes of which do not find echoes in others. Second, there is a noted trend as the letters progress toward longer, more technical, and more substantive philosophical discussions. This feature suggests that the Letters, aside from the apparently disparate themes and discussions along the way, also aim to demonstrate a philosophical education.

This aim is apparent early in the Letters. Seneca urges Lucilius in the first letter against the fault of wasting his time carelessly. In the second letter, he advises Lucilius on the correct approach to reading philosophical texts. In the fifth letter, he applauds Lucilius for persistence in his philosophical study but warns him to remain focused on the goal of philosophical study—that is, moral improvement—rather than the goal of many to simply make a show of philosophical talent. Seneca’s advice about philosophy—both how and what to study and how to apply it to one’s life—continues throughout the Letters. Scholars have long noted the apparent improvement of Lucilius as the Letters progress as evidence that Seneca means not simply to discuss philosophical progress but also to illustrate what it is like. The Lucilius of the early letters is not very sophisticated: the reader is made to suppose he is in the habit of requesting from Seneca pithy philosophical maxims to memorize. In Letter 33, Seneca chastises him for this and discontinues the practice of ending his letters with maxims. Later, in Letter 82, Seneca reports that he is happy with Lucilius’ progress. The later Letters also show Lucilius asking, apparently, more and more technical and difficult philosophical questions. Indeed, the later letters are, on the whole, considerably more philosophically rich than the early ones.

While Lucilius’ progress is arguably a theme that unites the letters, it is a theme that allows the philosophical discussions included in them to vary considerably. No one argument or position is systematically defended or articulated throughout the Letters as a whole. Instead, philosophical discussions are more localized, sometimes occupying the space of one letter, other times spanning a group of three or four. Sometimes a question addressed in one letter is picked up again much later. One can find in Seneca’s Letters various discussions of, to name a few, friendship, death, fate, poverty, moral theory, virtue, the good, argument, and much else. In all of his discussions, Seneca emphasizes the importance of being critical both of oneself and one’s way of living and of the received views, both popular and philosophical.

A brief account of the work’s first letter, though scarcely sufficient as a general introduction to the Letters, gives some indication of Seneca’s approach. The letter begins with some advice to Lucilius. He is to continue his efforts in devoting time to philosophical study. The theme of the Letter is just this—that too much time is wasted on worldly pursuits. Time flies, and as we delay what matters, life runs past. This theme is common in Latin literature: famous phrases like “tempus fugit” (from Vergil) and “carpe diem” (Horace) illustrate this. Seneca’s discussion of this offers no new philosophical insight. Still, as the letter continues, the philosophical point comes into view. The advice about wasting time generalizes to one’s life as a whole. To let one’s time slip away is to let oneself be occupied with things that are not really important. Seneca confesses that though he, too, wastes time, he has come to recognize when he is doing so. He counts this as progress and advises that Lucilius do what he can to keep what is really his.

As is typical of the Letters, this letter has Stoicism in view but does not heavy-handedly address or engage in Stoic theory. As a Stoic, Seneca is committed to the view that much of what one does in life is of little value. One’s day-to-day business contributes nothing to living a good life, unless one is considering the manner of his or her life. Seneca’s proposal that one should waste little, and be aware of what one is wasting, points to the Stoic view. What matters is acting virtuously, and this requires reflection on one’s actions. This is the first step to living well.

d. Anger, Grief, and the Therapy of Emotions

A defining principle of Stoicism is the claim that the mind is wholly rational, unlike Platonists and Aristotelians who posited a mind composed of both rational and non-rational parts. According to the Platonic/Aristotelian account of human psychology, emotions such as anger and fear could be explained by appeal to the non-rational parts of the mind, but on the Stoic view of the mind, no similar appeal can be made: Stoic theory suggests no non-rational aspects of the mind. The whole—unitary—mind is implicated in its actions. This feature of the Stoic theory has important implications for both its account of and its evaluation of emotions.

The Stoics view emotions as irrational movements of the mind. Since there are no non-rational parts of the mind, the Stoics understand a movement to be ‘irrational’ when it is contrary to right reason. Anger is a state in which one is not guided by correct reasoning. Fear is a state in which one is not guided by correct reasoning. And so on. Hence, emotions are states of mind that are contrary to right reason. One who is not angry would think and act differently than one who is. At least in the case of the perfect moral agent, these actions—that is, of someone who is not angry—would be fully guided by correct reasoning. The Stoics explain that the emotions arise when one assents to certain kinds of false statements about the world. Consider the following judgments one may make in response to having one’s car stolen:

S1: My car has been stolen.

S2: It is bad to have one’s car stolen.

S3: It is appropriate to respond to having one’s car stolen in an emotional way.

In an ordinary case, the Stoics claim, one’s episode of anger can be explained by appeal to these three propositions. One first encounters some state of affairs, articulates it, and assents to it—S1. One often goes on to form a secondary articulation, along the lines of S2, about the goodness or badness of this state of affairs. If one assents to this statement, one often continues to react in a way that somehow corresponds to the judgment reflected in S2. ‘S3’ is not exactly what one assents to. Instead, S3 is meant to capture something about the angry person’s response. Consider, for example, that an angry person might well scream “in anger” or do some violence to his surroundings or the like. The analysis of anger is meant to capture (via S3) this feature of anger (and other emotions).

According to Stoic theory, judgments of the form S2 and S3 are nearly always false. The Stoics hold that the only good is virtue and that the only evil is vice. All else is indifferent. According to this theory of value, having one’s car stolen is not bad; thus S2 is false. Similarly, since nothing bad has happened, the course of action sanctioned by S2 and S3 is illegitimate. No emotional response is appropriate.

Seneca devotes much of his philosophical work to advancing these aspects of Stoicism. The chief concern behind the Stoic theory of emotions and the theory of value is that until one removes such false beliefs about value, one will not succeed in living a happy life. It is with this that Seneca concerns himself in his philosophical work. He aims, for example, in On Anger to help his readers avoid becoming angry, and offers what little advice there is to help those who are angry stop being so. In the Consolations, he is concerned with helping his readers avoid the life shattering effects of grief. Elsewhere, Seneca works to help people let go of their fear of death.

In his Consolations in particular, as well as in his treatise On Anger and other works, Seneca is clearly more often concerned with helping people avoid experiencing emotions. As a Stoic, he is committed to the idea that emotional experiences involve false judgments. Still, Seneca does not typically concern himself with explicating the theory itself. While our reports from Greek doxagraphers and from Cicero preserve the outlines of the theory, Seneca feels no need to repeat it. One noteworthy exception to this is Seneca’s On Anger. Here (in Book II.1.4) Seneca explains the structure of an emotional experience. His explanation attempts to show that anger is voluntary despite the fact that one cannot entirely control the way things appear.

Seneca’s strategy is to explain anger in terms of three ‘movements’. The first movement, he says, is involuntary. It is the moment when the mind articulates some state of affairs—that ‘having my car stolen is a bad thing’. This may correspond, in some cases, with an elevated heart rate, a sinking feeling in one’s stomach, or the like. This initial experience is, Seneca claims, beyond one’s immediate control, but it is not anger. To be angry, one must “assent” to the proposition. That is, one must sanction the assertion that “such and such is a bad thing.” Once the assent is given, one is angry.

In distinguishing the first, involuntary, movement of anger from anger itself, Seneca seems to be responding (or reporting his source’s response) to an objection to the Stoic view. The Stoics claim that the wise person—the Sage—will not become angry (or experience any emotion) but cannot deny that the Sage will, for example, flinch at the loud bark of a dog or the sudden loud clap of thunder. Why, the objector may say, would the Sage flinch? To flinch is to assent to the proposition that something bad has happened. By separating the involuntary from the voluntary, Seneca answers this criticism.

While Seneca occasionally addresses theoretical matters in this way, he more commonly focuses on an issue—in this case, the emotions—from a different perspective. Seneca largely favors discussing issues from the perspective of the person who is making moral progress, rather than from the perspective of the wise person. This stands in contrast to the focus of other surviving Stoic texts which tend to focus on the morally perfect agent—the ‘Sage’—and her qualities. Those texts often characterize the Sage in a way that sets her very much apart from normal human beings. Seneca’s concern, however, is with the circumstances of those who are aspiring to be and do better.

This orientation can be seen very clearly in passages or whole works (like On Anger, Consolation to Marcia, and others) where he aims to help those who are imperiled by emotions. The aim of these works is not to point out that the Sage does not experience anger or grief, nor is the aim even primarily to say why the Sage does not experience these emotions. Instead, the aim is to appeal to those who are not wise and to offer them advice, informed of course by Stoic theory, to help them re-orient their thinking about their circumstances. In On Anger, for example, Seneca advises that an angry person look in the mirror. Clearly, this person will not find a Sage in the mirror. Instead, Seneca thinks, he will find something in his appearance that does not resonate well with his thinking about himself. Elsewhere, Seneca advises that the person who is grieving consider the difference an audience makes. When one finds that one grieves more in the presence of an audience, Seneca thinks this will force one to reflect on what the grief is really about. Is one’s grief, in other words, directed at the one who is gone or at oneself? These kinds of strategies for dealing with emotions are, in any case, very far removed from arguments about the value of the emotions and still further removed from theoretical accounts of the nature of the emotions. Seneca is convinced that the Stoic view is right, and he finds support for this conclusion in less theoretical, and more practical, aspects of human life.

e. Natural Philosophy

The received view of the Roman Stoics according to which the Romans were only concerned with ethics must be put aside in Seneca’s case. The opening lines of the Natural Questions articulate a view about the importance of physics that shows Seneca to be a clear exception. The very existence of the Natural Questions, one of Seneca’s longest philosophical treatises, shows this as well. He notes that “the difference between philosophy and other areas of study is as great as the difference, within philosophy itself, between the branch concerned with humans and the one concerned with the gods” (Praef.1, Hine, trans.). Seneca’s reference here to the branch concerned with the gods is a standard characterization of the ‘physics’, one of the three Hellenistic divisions of philosophy that Seneca inherits. For the Stoics, the study of physics, or natural philosophy, included the study of the divine. In Letter 88, Seneca claims that the liberal arts, here noted as the ‘other areas of study’, are only important insofar as they prepare the mind for philosophical study. Seneca’s claim at the beginning of the Natural Questions, then, suggests that all philosophical study ultimately aims at understanding of the gods. Even the “branch concerned with humans” (that is, ethics) has an aim beyond itself. According to the Stoic view, full moral progress requires a complete understanding of the nature of the divine. Seneca’s claims here, and elsewhere in the Natural Questions, suggest that he embraces the full range of Stoic philosophy despite the fact that most of his philosophical attention is devoted to matters central to the ‘branch concerned with humans.’

The outlines of Stoic physics are well documented in early sources. The Stoics are materialists, compatibilists, and theists. In the most general sense, the Stoics hold that the cosmos is entirely composed of matter but that certain forms of matter (fire, aether) are endowed with creative capacity. The human being’s mind is itself a composition of these elements. According to the Stoic view, the cosmos is a mind writ large, in the sense that the movements and developments in nature at the cosmic level are the result of guiding intelligence. For this reason, the Stoics regard “god,” “nature,” “fate,” “providence,” as roughly equivalent expressions. All refer to the active and creative element in the cosmos. To live according to nature ultimately requires that one come to adopt, or understand, the natural world from this cosmic perspective.

The surviving portions of Seneca’s Natural Questions are a survey of various meteorological phenomena undertaken in light of the broader Stoic understanding of the nature of the cosmos. Though the discussions are often narrowly focused on particular meteorological phenomena and their explanation, Seneca occasionally pauses to take a wider view. He considers, for example, the role that reflective surfaces (mirrors) play—and are supposed to play—in moral improvement (I.17 ff.). He explains the Stoic view that reason is the same for both gods and humans (Praef. 14). In a discussion of the cause of lightening (II.45), Seneca points to the Stoic view that “Jupiter,” “Providence,” “Fate,” and so on are all names for the active, divine element that shapes the universe.

The Natural Questions is an unfinished work. Passages like those above suggest that Seneca may have been revising or finishing the work with the aim of more carefully connecting his findings about meteorological phenomena to Stoic physics. They also suggest that, at least in some moments, Seneca may have been interested in providing a Stoic alternative to Lucretius’ explanation of many of the same phenomena in De Rerum Natura. The Stoic claim that the happenings of the natural world are guided by reason stands in stark contrast to the Epicurean view, articulated by Lucretius, that the world is generated and organized by chance.

f. Non-philosophical Works

Seneca wrote much besides his philosophical texts; however much of his work has been lost. Lost are all of his speeches, including those he penned for Nero. Also lost are some philosophical treatises, though some fragments survive from a treatise on marriage. The surviving non-philosophical works include the Apocolocyntosis, a work satirizing the deification of Claudius, and eight tragedies: Agamemnon, Hercules Furens, Medea, Thyestes, Oedipus, Phaedra, Phoenisse, and Troades. Scholars have long disagreed about the relation between Seneca’s philosophical prose and his tragic poetry. At one end of the spectrum, some ancient sources regarded the author of the tragedies to be a different Seneca altogether. While there is agreement now that our Seneca authored the tragedies, the relation between these works and his philosophical treatises is less agreed upon. On the one hand the tragedies are clearly concerned with many Stoic themes that Seneca addresses in his philosophical works. Despite this point of intersection, though, the tragedies do not seem to say the same about these themes. The most striking theme in this regard is the attention in the tragedies to the role of anger and other emotions. While the philosophical works (especially On Anger) attempt to persuade the reader to avoid becoming angry, the tragedies sometimes seem to elicit our sympathies for those who are angry and acting in anger. Similarly, as one commentator notes, the tragedies are rife with Stoic pronouncements (for example, “follow nature” Phaedra, 481) that are put forward in a manner inconsistent with the Stoic principles to which they give voice.

The Phaedra illustrates the second phenomena quite clearly. The title character, wife of Theseus, has fallen in love with her stepson, Hippolytus. After a failed effort to overcome her feelings for the boy, Phaedra’s cause of seducing Hippolytus is taken up by the Nurse, who agrees to help in order to prevent Phaedra’s suicide. The Nurse urges Hippolytus to “follow nature” as his guide. The Stoic imperative to follow nature is ordinarily understood as an injunction to live a life according to reason, to be virtuous, and to shun the circumstances of fortune. Here, though, the Nurse employs the phrase to encourage Hippolytus to do what most people do—namely, to pursue the pleasures of sex (Wilson, 2010). Hippolytus himself in this play seems, initially at least, to come closest to the Stoic ideal. In a long passage in Act II, he explains his love for the countryside and mountaintops, places in which he can be truly free from anger and other passions and from the vices that corrupt those who spend their time in society. Yet his peace comes at the price of seclusion and for the wrong reasons. The would-be sage seeks the isolation of the woods because of his hatred for all women. He notes that whether his hatred stems from “reason, nature, or passion” (567), it pleases him to hate them all.

The focus in the tragedies on the destructive force of emotions (especially anger) is plain. As one commentator notes, anger guides the action in all of Seneca’s plays (Wilson, 2010). In the Phaedra, Theseus’ anger at his son leads him to seek Hippolytus’ death. (Phaedra, whose advances were rejected by Hippolytus, has lied to her husband, accusing Hippolytus of raping her). In the Medea, Medea’s anger at Jason leads her to murder her own children. In the Thyestes, Atreus’ anger leads him to murder Thyestes’ children and feed them to him. While these portrayals of emotion forge a connection between the tragedies and the prose works, what that connection is remains unclear. How, for example, should one understand the significance of Phaedra’s, “What can reason do? Passion, passion rules!” (trans., Wilson) given Seneca’s claim elsewhere (On Anger II.1.4) that passions are voluntary?

Scholars have taken a number of positions on these issues. Some have argued that there is no connection between the tragedies and the philosophical works, while others have sought to show that the tragedies contain important philosophical lessons. Arguments of the latter kind are varied. Some have held that the tragedies are meant to illustrate the destructive influence of passions; others have argued that the tragedies should be read in light of Seneca’s Stoic metaphysics. These scholars emphasize the role of fate, providence, and divination in the tragedies. Finally, one scholar has argued that the guiding philosophical concern in the tragedies is epistemological (Staley, 2010). On this view, Seneca’s tragedies, offer a kind of ‘clarification’ of the cognitive processes of those who are under the sway of passions.

Whatever relation they are ultimately thought to have to his philosophical works, Seneca’s tragedies, his Apocolocyntosis, and his lost speeches serve to alert readers of his philosophical works to his literary talent. Scholars have rarely attempted a full account of all his works undertaken with the aim of clarifying or even producing an account of Seneca the author. The difficulty of such an undertaking suggests that caution is needed in assuming that Seneca is primarily a philosopher. Seneca appears to have been comfortable writing in many genres. His comfort, moreover, provides a further clue that Seneca’s life was either plagued by or fortunate in (depending on how one sees it) his constant contact with both philosophy and with the politics and culture of Rome.

g. Criticism and Influence

Both Seneca’s life and his works have been targets of criticism since his own lifetime, during which, of course, he was charged and convicted of both adultery and conspiracy. Though the evidence in neither of these cases is clearly decisive, they added to the growing criticism that Seneca’s way of life undermined his philosophical message. This criticism gained more traction from the fact that Seneca, who writes that poverty is not an evil, was one of the wealthiest men in the world. This criticism of Seneca was first made publicly by Publius Suilius, a political enemy of Seneca who was, according to Tacitus, angered by Nero’s revival of a law against pleading for money. Suilius, it seems, believed that this revival resulted from Seneca’s influence. Tacitus reports that Suilius taunted Seneca publicly, reminding the Roman elites of Seneca’s affair with Julia Livilla, and most importantly, asking the following question of his fellow Romans: “By what kind of wisdom or maxims of philosophy had Seneca within four years of royal favour ammassed three hundred million sesterces?” (Tacitus, Annals XIII.42, Church & Brodribb, trans.). Although little independent evidence exists to confirm Suilius’ claim about the extent of Seneca’s wealth or how he acquired it, this passage from Tacitus’ Annals has served as a source for many readers of Seneca since its publication. The result is that Seneca’s political enemy has in a way won the battle of public opinion. Scholars have noted that some caution is needed in evaluating this charge against Seneca, but the fact that Seneca was very wealthy and at the same time wrote that one should be content with what one has—and that poverty is, in itself, no evil—has been a lasting criticism.

This example denotes a broader line of criticism that Seneca is inconsistent. His wealth and his pronouncements about the value of poverty are but one example. To this can be added his praise of the philosophical life together with his recurrent involvement in Roman politics. Seneca is made, in Tacitus, to plead his case for retirement before Nero, yet Seneca is clearly (in both the Consolation to Helvia and to Polybius) eager to return to Rome during his period of exile. Seneca seems, then, to have little but praise for the philosophical life withdrawn from the business of Rome, yet cannot fully embrace that life himself. In his On Mercy, Seneca encourages the young emperor Nero to take to heart the point that while many may have the power to put others to death, he alone has the power to give life (that is, to allow life where the punishment of death is justified), yet Seneca may well have been party to Nero’s assassination of his own mother. At the very least, Seneca was unable to stop Nero. Again, Seneca upholds the importance of freedom from emotion in living a happy life. He encourages daily exercises to rid oneself of anger and other emotions, yet he writes tragedies in which unbridled emotions are the central focus. He encourages his readers to reflect on what is really theirs and to distance themselves from the inner workings of the political mob, yet he writes a political satire (the Apocolocyntosis) which assumes detailed knowledge of the inner workings of imperial court under Claudius. Finally, Seneca is reported to have written Nero’s address for the funeral of Claudius. While this work is lost to us, it is unlikely that it had much in common with the Pumpkinification of Claudius, which he must have penned at around the same time.

These features of Seneca’s life and work have been both targets for criticism and spurs for investigation. To his credit, Seneca denies (even in the Letters, some of his latest works) that he is close to living a fully philosophical life. He works toward this goal but falls short. Notwithstanding his own profession of philosophical failure, the spirit of his philosophical works seems clearly (to the extent that we can see clearly into his life) undermined by his role in Roman life. A number of views can be taken here. Perhaps Seneca simply fails to live the philosophical life he aspires to live. Perhaps his philosophical ambitions were really secondary to his political ambitions. While many scholars have noted the inconsistencies and many have rejected Seneca’s work on the grounds of hypocrisy, some scholars (notably Emily Wilson) have challenged this view. Wilson notes that, “The most interesting question is not why Seneca failed to practice what he preached, but why he preached what he did, so adamantly and so effectively, given the life he found himself leading” (Wilson, 2014).

A final and more philosophically substantive criticism also relies on a claim that there is some disparity between what Seneca advises and what Seneca does. This criticism, articulated by J. M. Cooper, argues that Seneca’s aim to guide his reader toward moral improvement is ultimately undermined by his advice to avoid the study of logic. Stoic theory requires that one have knowledge of ethics, physics, and logic. The Stoics, in fact, have much to say about the important interconnections among these three branches of study. Though one may begin with ethics, one’s philosophical study is simply not complete unless one has mastered the arguments forms that fall under the scope of logic. Despite this, Seneca repeatedly tells his readers, particularly in the Letters, that the study of advanced logic, including Zeno’s syllogisms and certain logical fallacies, are a waste of time. In doing so, Seneca is advising his readers to avoid something that is, according to his own theory, necessary for moral progress.

Despite these criticisms, Seneca’s works have been widely read since his own lifetime. Seneca’s works, along with Cicero’s, were much more readily accessible to medieval Europeans who no longer read Greek. Thus, Seneca served for a long time as one of only a few sources for Stoic philosophy. Seneca’s works were well received by Christian thinkers in the Early Middle Ages. This was no doubt partly due to the forged correspondence (long thought to be genuine) between Seneca and the apostle Paul. Partly though, Seneca’s acceptance by Christian thinkers was surely due to similarities between Christian and Stoic doctrines. Seneca’s doctrine of the first movements of emotions—those experiences of being drawn toward something or the initial experience that precedes becoming angry or grief stricken – find welcome reception in Christian thinkers who are working on accounts of temptation and the original failings of human nature.

During and after the Renaissance, Seneca’s works continued to be read widely. How much Seneca alone, apart from other surviving Stoic sources (including Cicero’s philosophical works), influenced a particular philosopher’s thinking is difficult to tell, but Seneca was clearly read. Descartes, for example, used Seneca’s On the Happy Life as the basis for the ethical view he develops in his correspondence with Princess Elizabeth. A near contemporary of Descartes, Justus Lipsius, relied on Seneca’s philosophy heavily in his attempt to develop a new form of Stoicism suitable to his age. One can find many references to Seneca in the works of philosophers throughout the history of philosophy in Europe. Seneca’s influence and importance can perhaps be seen most clearly in cases where philosophers identify with Seneca’s philosophical views and at the same time sympathize with the circumstances of his life. Thomas More, for example, who was also an advisor to a powerful monarch, read Seneca widely. It has been noted that one source for More’s Utopia was likely Seneca’s (incomplete) treatise De Otio (On Leisure). There, Seneca notes that the ideal state is “no place” (nusquam).

The influence of Seneca’s work, especially his account of the emotions and their therapy, can be seen in the work of philosophers such as Foucault and Pierre Hadot, who have both developed accounts of living philosophy. This includes focus on the source of one’s troubling emotions—anxiety, fear, anger—and how philosophy can address these. In psychology, the Stoic account of the emotions as cognitive has been influential in the development of cognitive therapies. Albert Ellis, for example, who developed rational emotive behavioral therapy (REBT), was heavily influenced by Stoic views of the emotions, and especially by Seneca.

3. References and Further Reading

a. Texts and Translations

All of Seneca’s works are available in English translation. For many years, the Loeb Series, which includes Latin and English side by side, translated by Gummere (Letters) and Basore (Dialogi or Moral Essays) were the standard English translations. New translations of particular works or selections of letters have been published. Inwood’s 2007 collection contains extensive philosophical commentary on a collection of 17 philosophically substantive Letters.

Campbell, Robin, trans. Seneca: Letters from a Stoic. Penguin Classics. 2004.
Inwood, Brad, trans. Seneca: Selected Philosophical Letters. Oxford; New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Epistulae Morales (Letters). Trans. Richard M. Gummere. London: Harvard University Press, 1917. 3 vols. Loeb.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Moral Essays. Trans. John W. Basore. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1928. 3 vols. Loeb.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Tragedies. Trans. John G. Fitch. Annotated edition. Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press, 2002. 2 vols. Loeb.
Wilson, Emily, trans. Seneca: Six Tragedies. Oxford World’s Classics. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.

An effort to produce new translations of all of Seneca’s works is currently underway through the University of Chicago Press. As of 2015, the following four volumes were available.

Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Anger, Mercy, and Revenge. Trans. Robert Kaster and Martha Nussbaum. Chicago: London: University of Chicago Press, 2010.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Hardship and Happiness. Trans. Elaine Fantham et. al. Chicago ; London: University Of Chicago Press, 2014.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. Natural Questions. Trans. Harry Hine. Chicago; London: University Of Chicago Press, 2010.
Seneca, Lucius Annaeus. On Benefits. Trans. Miriam Griffin and Brad Inwood. Chicago: University Of Chicago Press, 2011.

b. Secondary Literature

Bartsch, Shadi and Wray, David, eds. Seneca and the Self. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
- A collection of essays evaluating Seneca’s contribution to the modern notion(s) of the Self.
Cooper, John M. Knowledge, Nature, and the Good: Essays on Ancient Philosophy. Princeton University Press, 2009.
- Chapter 12, “Moral Theory and Improvement: Seneca,” argues that Seneca’s dislike for logic is incompatible with his Stoic allegiance.
Fitch, John G., ed. Oxford Readings in Classical Studies: Seneca. New York: Oxford University Press, 2008.
- A collection of essays on many aspects of Seneca’s work—both philosophical and poetic.
Griffin, Miriam T. Seneca: A Philosopher in Politics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1992.
- An extensive study of what Seneca’s philosophical writings can tell us about his role as a political agent.
Hadot, Ilsetraut. Seneca und die Griechisch-Römische Tradition der Seelenleitung. Berlin: Walter De Gruyter & Co., 1969.
- Places Seneca’s work as a spiritual advisor to his audience in the context of Greco-Roman spiritual advice literature from Homer to Seneca.
Inwood, Brad. Reading Seneca: Stoic Philosophy at Rome. Oxford; New York: Oxford University Press, 2008.
- A collection of essays that explicate Seneca’s thinking about a number of philosophical problems.
Ker, James. The Deaths of Seneca. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
- An examination of Seneca’s life and work through the lenses of the various accounts of his death, both ancient and later.
Romm, James. Dying Every Day: Seneca at the Court of Nero. New York, Vintage Books, 2014.
- A biography aimed at reconciling the apparently incompatible versions of Seneca—the wealthy man who praises poverty, the philosopher who is so engaged in politics, and so forth. Romm focuses consistently on the role that death and thinking about death play in Seneca’s life and works.
Wilson, Emily. The Greatest Empire: A Life of Seneca. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2014.
- A biography of Seneca informed by what is known about the dates of his philosophical and non-philosophical works. Wilson aims to explain, as much as possible, various tensions in the reception of Seneca.
Volk, Katharina, and Gareth D. Williams. Seeing Seneca Whole: Perspectives on Philosophy, Poetry, and Politics. Brill, 2006.
- A collection of essays from a variety of standpoints—philosophical, literary, historical—aimed at clarifying Seneca’s status as an author of many genres.

Author Information

Robert Wagoner
Email: wagonerr@uwosh.edu
University of Wisconsin Oshkosh
U. S. A.

Religious Disagreement

The domain of religious inquiry is characterized by pervasive and seemingly intractable disagreement. Whatever stance one takes on central religious questions—for example, whether God exists, what the nature of God might be, whether the world has a purpose, whether there is life beyond death—one will stand opposed to a large contingent of highly informed and intelligent thinkers. The fact of extensive religious disagreement raises several distinct philosophical questions. One significant question arises within the context of political philosophy: may religious conceptions of the good and the right legitimately ground one’s political convictions in a pluralistic society marked by diverse and often conflicting religious convictions? Other questions concern the possibility of reconciling disagreement data with specific religious beliefs. For example, can persistent religious disagreement be squared with the conviction of many Christians and other theists that God “desires everyone to be saved and to come to knowledge of the truth” (I Timothy 2:4, NRSV)? These and other important questions will not be taken up here. The focus of this article is the epistemic challenge raised by religious disagreement: does awareness of the nature and extent of religious disagreement make it unreasonable to hold confident religious, or explicitly irreligious, views? Many philosophers have answered this question in the affirmative, arguing that the proper response to religious disagreement is religious skepticism. Others contend that religious conviction may be reasonably maintained even in the face of disagreement with highly qualified thinkers.

Reflecting on the epistemic challenge posed by religious disagreement readily leads one to questions concerning the epistemic significance of disagreement in general, religious or otherwise. One might think that religious disagreement does not raise any distinctive epistemological questions beyond those that are addressed in a more general work on disagreement. There are, however, features of religious disagreements that present problems that, for the most part, are not adequately addressed in such a work. These features include the lack of agreement on what skills, virtues, and qualifications are most important for assessing the questions under dispute; the fact that many of the disputed beliefs are arguably epistemically fundamental; the significant evidential weight that is assigned to private experiences; and the prominence of practical or pragmatic considerations in the justifications offered for opposing viewpoints. While these features taken individually may not be exclusive to religious disagreements, the fact that they frequently coincide in religious disputes and are especially salient in such disputes makes religious disagreement a worthy epistemological topic in its own right. The bulk of this article will focus on these problematic features of religious disagreements and the special questions they raise.

The First-Order and Higher-Order Significance of Religious Disagreement
The Conciliatory Argument for the Higher-Order Defeat of Religious Belief
Permissivist Responses to the Conciliatory Argument
Religious Belief and the Problem of Judging Epistemic Credentials
Fundamental Versus Superficial Disagreements
Appeals to Religious Experience
Faith and Practical Responses to the Problem of Religious Disagreement
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. The First-Order and Higher-Order Significance of Religious Disagreement

Religious disagreement may present two distinct sorts of evidential challenges to a given religious belief: a first-order challenge and higher-order challenge. (Henceforth, the label “religious belief” will typically be used to refer to all beliefs that take a stand on religious questions, including explicitly irreligious beliefs such as the belief that there is no God.) The aim of this section is to clarify the distinction between first-order and higher-order evidential challenges and to look at examples of how religious disagreement may possess first-order significance for religious belief. The remaining sections will focus on the higher-order challenge posed by religious disagreement.

In the epistemological literature on disagreement, a contrast is frequently drawn between first-order and higher-order evidence (Kelly 2005). The distinction may roughly be characterized as follows. First-order evidence for or against some proposition p “directly” bears on the question of whether p, whereas higher-order evidence for or against p does not directly bear on the question of whether p but directly bears on the question of whether one has rationally assessed the first-order evidence for or against p. To illustrate the distinction, consider the case (from Rotondo 2013) of Detective, who has stayed up all night studying the evidence bearing on a particular crime. At the end of the lengthy process of sifting the evidence, Detective judges that it is very likely that Lefty, rather than Righty, committed the crime. When she calls Lieutenant to share her conclusion, Lieutenant asks whether Detective has stayed up all night and then informs Detective that every time Detective has stayed up all night in the past, her reasoning has been atrocious and unreliable (despite its seeming to Detective that nothing is amiss). Let’s call this fact that Detective has a bad track record after all-nighters UNRELIABLE. According to many epistemologists, upon learning UNRELIABLE, Detective ought to become significantly less confident that Lefty committed the crime. (Still, there are others [Lasonen-Aarnio 2014 and Titelbaum 2015] who argue that Detective should not reduce confidence if she in fact assessed the first-order evidence correctly.) Thus, UNRELIABLE is arguably evidence against Detective’s proposition that Lefty committed the crime. However, UNRELIABLE does not directly bear on the question of whether Lefty committed the crime in the same way that the evidence Detective stayed up examining does. It is not as though UNRELIABLE is more to be expected if Righty committed the crime than if Lefty committed the crime: someone who had a full night’s sleep before examining the evidence inspected by Detective could dismiss UNRELIABLE as evidentially irrelevant. If UNRELIABLE gives Detective reason to doubt the Lefty hypothesis, it is only because UNRELIABLE is higher-order evidence that raises doubts about any conclusion that Detective might have reached after an all-nighter.

Facts about religious disagreement may pose first-order or higher-order evidential worries (or both) for religious belief.

Suppose that religious view R1 suggests a view of human nature where persistent religious disagreement is to be expected, while religious view R2 suggests a view of human nature where persistent religious disagreement would be very surprising (though not impossible). Given this supposition, persistent religious disagreement would constitute first-order evidence in favor of R1 over R2. In addition to this first-order significance of religious disagreement, however, facts about disagreement may constitute higher-order evidence against both religious views if these facts raise worries about the rationality of one’s religious views or the reliability of the process by which one’s religious beliefs have been formed. Alternatively, we can imagine a situation where widespread religious agreement on the truth of R1 provides higher-order support of R1 (by boosting one’s confidence in the general reliability of religious belief formation) even though religious agreement is unexpected given R1, and thus counts as first-order evidence against it. The first-order significance of religious disagreement is thus distinct from its higher-order significance.

An example of an argument in the philosophy of religion that makes claims about the first-order significance of religious disagreement is the argument from divine hiddenness. This argument against theism begins by noting that according to most theists, the highest good for a human being is to be in a loving relationship with God. Many theists also claim that since God loves all human beings, God desires to be in a loving relationship with each human person. If this view is a component of theism, then, given theism, we have reason to expect that God would make God’s existence evident to all—for the lack of belief that God exists is a barrier to the loving relationship that God desires. The fact that many intelligent and thoughtful people fail to believe in God, including many people who indicate they would like to believe in God if it were possible for them to do so, is evidence that God has not made God’s existence very evident, contrary to what theism might lead us to expect. Thus, extensive and pervasive disagreement over whether God exists is claimed to be evidence against theism.

John Hick (2004) offers a very different characterization of the first-order evidential significance of religious disagreement. Rather than suggesting that such disagreement supplies an evidential basis for atheism, Hick suggests that such disagreement can instead be viewed as evidence that genuine encounters with “the Real”—that transcendent reality that is the source of salvation and that is encountered in all of the world’s great religions—are inevitably understood through conceptual frames that prevent unproblematic cognitive access to the Real as it is in itself and lead to diverse, and often conflicting, interpretations of such experiences. This position, which Hick labels “religious pluralism,” is not motivated by intractable religious disagreement alone. Hick emphasizes that the major world religions have all proven to be successful as vehicles that move practitioners from “self-centredness” to “Reality-centredness,” and this ethical parity across multiple faiths is seen by Hick as undermining the basis for thinking that one religious tradition may reasonably claim supremacy in the veridicality of its teaching. However, it is clear that Hick’s pluralism would be unmotivated if it were the case that religious dialogue typically led to an end of religious disagreement and to agreement on the teachings of one religious tradition. Hence, the fact of persistent religious disagreement does play a crucial evidential role in the case for Hick’s pluralistic hypothesis.

The argument for divine hiddenness and the case for religious pluralism can both be understood as appeals to the first-order rather than higher-order significance of religious disagreement. Consider first Hick’s pluralism. Since pluralism is itself a controversial and significantly contested religious viewpoint, the higher-order worries raised by disagreement as discussed below would seem, at least initially, to apply as much to the belief in pluralism as to other religious convictions. Considered as a piece of first-order evidence, however, religious disagreement does lend more support to religious pluralism than to many other religious hypotheses. If culturally-conditioned interpretive frameworks are as entrenched and significant as pluralists contend, then we should expect religious conversion to be fairly rare and religious disagreement to be rather intractable, as is in fact the case. Many non-pluralist religious perspectives will have a harder time accommodating this datum. Similarly, the argument from divine hiddenness is clearly a first-order rather than higher-order challenge to theistic belief. Even if religious disagreement did not pose a higher-order challenge to the theist, the fact of significant and persistent disagreement over theism could still be first-order evidence against theism. For example, even if a theist somehow knew that she and her fellow theists were in possession of more evidence than non-theists, so that the disagreement over theism did not give her any reason for questioning whether or not she and other theists have made some error in their assessment of the evidence, the fact that many reject theism, even if due to lack of information, would still constitute evidence against theism since prevalent disbelief is more to be expected given atheism than theism.

2. The Conciliatory Argument for the Higher-Order Defeat of Religious Belief

We turn now from the first-order significance of religious disagreement to an argument for the claim that religious disagreement constitutes higher-order evidence that renders religious belief (or at least many religious beliefs) unjustified—that is, that religious disagreement constitutes a higher-order defeater for religious belief. The argument for this conclusion can be seen as consisting of two components: one a priori and the other a posteriori. The a priori component aims to defend some general “conciliatory” policy that says that in disagreements that satisfy certain conditions, the proper response is a conciliatory one that gives significant weight to the views of one’s disputants. This conciliatory response might involve giving up one’s belief and adopting an agnostic stance towards the question under dispute. Or, if someone’s doxastic state is better described not in terms of belief or unbelief, but in terms of subjective probabilities or “credences,” then the appropriate conciliatory response might involve adopting a new credence for the disputed proposition that gives significant weight to the initial credences of one’s disputants. The a posteriori component of the argument aims to show that the core commitments of religious believers are in fact subject to the relevant type of disagreement—a disagreement where the aforementioned conciliatory principle requires significant reduction in confidence.

a. Strong Conciliatory Policies

The a priori stage of the argument defends some conciliatory policy that is demanding enough to require significant reduction of confidence in religious disagreements. There is no canonical conciliatory policy that is agreed upon by those who argue that disagreement has significant higher-order force, but a variety of conciliatory requirements have been proposed, some more demanding than others. Despite the diversity of conciliatory proposals, one can discern behind the most demanding conciliatory views two basic commitments (Vavova 2014). The first is a principle that requires epistemic deference to other thinkers in proportion to their apparent epistemic qualifications, and the second is a principle that constrains the types of reasons to which one can legitimately appeal when assessing the relative epistemic qualifications of the various sides of the dispute. It is worth separating these principles out, since some criticisms of the most demanding conciliatory views can be understood as targeting the first principle, while others, the second. We might articulate these principles as follows:

DEFERENCE: In a disagreement over p, one ought to show epistemic deference to suitably qualified thinkers, giving equal weight to one’s own view and the view of an apparent epistemic peer (where an “epistemic peer” is someone whose epistemic credentials with respect to p are equal to one’s own) and more weight to the view of someone who appears to be one’s epistemic superior.

INDEPENDENCE: In assessing my own and my disputant’s epistemic credentials with respect to p, in order to determine how (or whether) to modify my own belief about p, I should base my assessment on grounds that are independent of my disputed reasoning concerning p. (Adapted from Christensen 2011.)

Consider DEFERENCE first. The basic idea behind DEFERENCE is that one cannot reasonably maintain confident belief that p while thinking that those who reject p are just as qualified and well-positioned to assess the plausibility of p as those on one’s own side of the dispute. For example, according to DEFERENCE, someone who believes that Muhammad is a prophet of God cannot reasonably think that those who reject this claim are, taken as a whole, just as qualified to assess the claim as those who accept it. Whether DEFERENCE is plausible partly depends on what is meant by “epistemic credentials.” The principle is plausible only if our understanding of epistemic credentials is such that we should expect those who are more credentialed to be more reliable in their views on the disputed question than those who are less credentialed. This means that epistemic credentials must be assessed relative to the particular proposition under dispute and the particular occasion when the proposition was assessed. Furthermore, the relevant credentials must take into account all of the dimensions of epistemic evaluation that bear on the reliability of one’s judgment on the matter at hand, such as the quality and quantity of one’s evidence and the ability to assess that evidence in a rational and unbiased manner. This understanding of epistemic credentials may not align with conventional notions of expertise. For example, someone who is a leading researcher on a contested scientific question might count as less credentialed than a well-informed non-specialist if there is concern that the researcher’s personal involvement has biased her judgment.

Given a sufficiently fine-grained understanding of epistemic credentials, DEFERENCE looks very plausible. Those who reject DEFERENCE must affirm that there are situations where I can reasonably stand by my view that p even though I acknowledge that my epistemic position with respect to p is no stronger than that enjoyed by my interlocutor who denies p. It seems that in such a situation, I would need to hold that, despite our equally strong epistemic positions, I was simply lucky in arriving at the truth and my interlocutor was not. Many writing on disagreement seem to take it for granted that this would not be a rational position. Even those who oppose demanding conciliatory views typically hold that in order to dismiss the worries raised by disagreement, it is necessary to identify a “symmetry breaker” (Lackey 2010), or some reason for thinking that one’s own side is better placed to assess the disputed matter than the opposition. In the next section, we consider one response to disagreement-motivated religious skepticism that involves rejecting DEFERENCE.

INDEPENDENCE is the more controversial of the two conciliatory principles offered above. Christensen (2009), who is responsible for labeling the principle, argues that INDEPENDENCE is the key principle separating “conciliationists” and their opponents. According to Christensen, INDEPENDENCE captures what is wrong with “blatantly question-begging” responses to disagreement (2011). He gives an example where two individuals who are sharing a dinner at a restaurant with several friends both calculate in their head what each person’s share of the total bill comes to (Christensen 2007). They agree to add 20% of the post-tax total for tip and to split the check evenly among each member of the party. Both friends do this sort of calculation often and know that the other person is no more or less reliable than they are. They usually agree on the answer in such cases, but in those instances when they do reach different answers, neither of them has proven more likely than the other to be the one who has made an error. While nothing is out of the ordinary in this case (for example, neither friend is especially distracted or extra alert), upon finishing their mental calculations they discover that their answers differ: one arrived at an answer of $43, and the other, $45. According to Christensen (2011), INDEPENDENCE is needed to explain why it would be illegitimate for one of the two friends to dismiss the significance of the disagreement by reasoning as follows: “Since my friend fails to see that the facts support an answer of $43, I have good reason for thinking that, contrary to my expectations, she is not (at least at this moment) a reliable judge of the question we are disputing; therefore, her disagreement gives me no reason at all to question my answer.”

Most agree that this sort of response to the disagreement is unreasonably sanguine. But it is questionable whether a principle as strong as INDEPENDENCE is needed to explain why this response is unreasonable (Kelly 2013). Note that in the present example, the speaker did not have any reason to be dismissive of his friend’s view antecedent to learning that she arrived at a different answer. His only reason for judging that she was unreliable was the fact that her answer differed from his. Such crudely dogmatic reasoning, if acceptable, could be used to dismiss as misleading any piece of evidence that goes against what one believes. This is quite different from a situation where someone’s belief that p gives him a reason for thinking, even before learning what his friend thinks about p, that his friend is unlikely to be reliable in her judgment concerning p. Consider, for instance, a situation where someone comes to believe in a religion that teaches that the wealthy are frequently biased when it comes to assessing spiritual questions. Such a person has a reason for distrusting his wealthy friend’s opinion concerning the religion even before learning what her opinion is. Suppose the new convert learns that his wealthy friend does reject the new religion as false, but the convert is largely unworried by the disagreement since his new religion teaches that the wealthy are biased on such matters. While this dismissal appeals to dispute-dependent reasons and thus violates INDEPENDENCE, the dismissal would not be based on the crude sort of dogmatic reasoning that would always be available in any dispute. It is at least less obvious in this case that the dispute-dependent reasoning is objectionable. This provides some reason for doubting whether a strong anti-question-begging principle like INDEPENDENCE is needed in order to explain why the quick dismissal in the calculation case is problematic.

b. Modest Conciliatory Policies

The last section focused on the most demanding sort of conciliatory policy, which features both DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE. But many proponents of broadly conciliatory views advocate less demanding policies that feature weaker principles than these. In particular, many seek to avoid some of the radical implications that are thought to follow from INDEPENDENCE, opting instead for a weaker anti-question-begging constraint. To see why INDEPENDENCE taken as a general requirement is thought to support implausibly demanding prescriptions, suppose you find yourself in a disagreement with a radical skeptic who believes that human cognitive faculties, including those employed in philosophical reasoning, are systematically unreliable. You might have many reasons for thinking that this skeptic is not particularly qualified with respect to philosophical matters. Perhaps he has not read any academic philosophy and succumbs to several logical fallacies in his argumentation. Still, these reasons for putting little trust in your interlocutor would not be dispute-independent, since you should not trust your ability to judge epistemic credentials if you took seriously the skeptic’s view that your cognitive faculties are systematically unreliable. It would seem, then, that in this context, you cannot have dispute-independent reasons for thinking that you are more qualified than your disputant. Of course, you also cannot have dispute-independent reasons for thinking that your disputant is more qualified. Nonetheless, a lack of dispute-independent reasons for favoring either side may itself be considered a dispute-independent reason for having an equal estimation of the epistemic credentials of the two sides. If this is right, then INDEPENDENCE, in combination with DEFERENCE, would seem to require that you give up believing in the reliability of your cognitive faculties. Since most do not think that we must have non-question-begging reasons for rejecting skepticism, even when we encounter a real skeptic, many advocates of conciliatory views aim to articulate an anti-question-begging constraint that is less absolute than INDEPENDENCE. Conciliatory views that feature a weaker anti-question-begging requirement may nonetheless be sufficiently powerful to undermine religious beliefs.

One example of a weaker anti-question-begging requirement is that proposed by Schellenberg (2007, 171). Schellenberg allows that the need to avoid the most general skepticism warrants trusting those belief-forming mechanisms that are (nearly) universal and unavoidable, even when there are no non-question-begging reasons for such trust. This would explain why we need not capitulate in disagreements with an isolated skeptic who doubts the reliability of our perceptual, memorial, and/or inferential faculties. According to Schellenberg, however, a mechanism that is neither universal nor unavoidable should not be trusted in the absence of independent grounds for thinking that it is reliable. Since he maintains that religious belief-formation is neither universal nor unavoidable, and since it is not possible in the current context of religious controversy to give non-question-begging grounds for taking some particular mechanism of religious belief formation to be reliable, Schellenberg concludes that religious skepticism is the only rational option.

Alston (1991, 198-9) has contested the claim that non-universal belief-forming mechanisms should be held to higher epistemic standards than universal mechanisms, claiming that there is no reason to suppose that all mechanisms worthy of default trust will be common to all or most mature adults. Additionally, Schellenberg’s criteria appear to have consequences that many would find dubious.

Consider the example (adapted from Plantinga [2000, 450]) of someone in colonial America who is strongly inclined towards the view that chattel slavery is morally abhorrent, but who is not unavoidably drawn to this conclusion. Schellenberg’s criteria seem to imply that such a person cannot rationally judge slavery to be morally abhorrent unless she can cite dispute-independent reasons for thinking her own moral views are more likely to be reliable than the majority position. This is an unpalatable conclusion, since it is questionable whether such dispute-independent reasons could be identified.

Another attempt to articulate a more qualified constraint on question-begging is that supplied by Christensen (2011). Christensen acknowledges that in a dispute with a radical skeptic (or with someone else who questions all of the beliefs we rely on to assess epistemic credentials), we lack a dispute-independent reason for thinking that we are more qualified than our disputant. Nevertheless, he argues that the mere absence of dispute-independent reasons for favoring one’s own side is not enough for disagreement to pose legitimate skeptical worries. Nor will disagreements pose serious skeptical worries in cases where a dispute-independent evaluation produces only a very weak reason for thinking that the credentials of one’s disputant rival or surpass one’s own. On the contrary, significant conciliation will typically be required only when there are sufficiently strong positive dispute-independent grounds for trusting the other side. Christensen’s bill tabulation case, where the disagreeing friends have significant track record data that suggest that they are equally reliable at mental math, is an example where the disputants have strong dispute-independent reasons for taking the other person to be an epistemic peer, resulting in significant conciliatory pressure. In contrast, consider a disagreement between two philosophers who systematically disagree across a wide range of ethical questions. While these philosophers might acknowledge that they are both comparable in intelligence, degree of philosophical training, and general intellectual virtue, this sort of parity provides a much weaker reason (in comparison to the solid track record data of the first case) for thinking that the other person is an approximate peer. Christensen’s view would therefore suggest that the conciliatory pressure is weaker in this latter case. The significance of Christensen’s moderate conciliationism for religious belief is discussed in section 4.

c. The a Posteriori Stage of the Argument

No plausible conciliatory policy will require giving up religious belief in the face of just any disagreement. Plausible policies will require religious skepticism only if one’s religious beliefs are contested by a sufficiently large and qualified contingent of individuals. The full argument that religious disagreement defeats some religious belief must do more than merely assert that the belief is contested; it must assert that the degree of dissent is significant enough that the correct view on disagreement will require abandoning the belief. This is the a posteriori stage of the argument, which has received little attention despite the fact that it is far from trivial. Consider the evidential implications of the distribution of opinion concerning the existence of God. A 2010 poll of over 18,000 adults conducted by Ipsos in 23 countries found that 51% of respondents reported believing in at least one God or “Supreme Being,” 17% reported sometimes believing and sometimes not believing, 13% reported not being sure if they believe, and 18% indicated that they do not believe in any sort of divine being. These percentages vary only slightly across different levels of education. The epistemic import of this data is far from clear. Kelly (2011) suggests that the fact that theistic belief is significantly more prevalent than atheistic belief constitutes evidence that at least slightly supports theism. But some proponents of religious skepticism may argue that the exact proportions are not very significant, and that what is epistemically significant is the lack of consensus. Additionally, many hold that the beliefs in the overall population are far less significant than the beliefs of those with relevant expertise. And atheism is the dominant position in certain communities of experts. For example, a large 2009 survey of professional philosophers conducted by Bourget and Chalmers at 99 leading departments found that 73% of professional philosophers accepted or leaned towards atheism, while only 15% accepted or leaned towards theism. On the other hand, most philosophers specializing in philosophy of religion were theists, with 72% accepting or leaning towards theism and only 19% accepting or leaning towards atheism. Draper and Nichols (2013) argue that the specialists in philosophy of religion are significantly influenced by pro-religious biases, a claim which, if true, would perhaps significantly diminish the epistemic significance of the prominence of theistic belief among philosophers of religion. No doubt some theists would counter that certain selection effects and anti-theistic biases in the wider professional culture of philosophy help to explain the prominence of atheism among philosophers as a whole. In any case, many religious believers would contest the notion that philosophical expertise is the most important qualification for reliably evaluating religious questions (see section 4). Clearly, several delicate and contentious questions must be addressed by anyone attempting to measure the degree of qualified opposition to a given religious perspective.

d. The Scope of the Conciliatory Argument

Some proponents of disagreement-motivated religious skepticism target any confident view on contentious religious questions, including those atheistic perspectives that would not typically be labeled “religious.” Others argue that religious disagreement defeats the justification of explicitly religious worldviews, but do not think that secular atheism is similarly threatened. According to Kitcher (2014, 7), “the religious convictions of many contemporary believers are formed in very much the same ways,” namely, through trusting a religious community that claims to preserve and pass on the teachings of prophets and mystics who had some special connection with God or the transcendent. Since this process leads to incompatible beliefs when it is employed in different cultural contexts, the process is unreliable and cannot justifiably be trusted. Because Kitcher does not think that religious disagreement undermines secular atheism—indeed, he appeals to religious disagreement precisely to motivate a “soft atheism” that makes “small concessions in the direction of agnosticism” (23-4)—he presumably thinks that acceptance of secular atheism is not based on a process of communal trust that is relevantly like the unreliable sort of trust that typically grounds religious conviction. Thus, religious disagreement defeats those beliefs typically labeled “religious,” but does not defeat secular convictions.

A significant problem for this more narrowly targeted defeat argument is that many religious believers will deny that the process by which they hold their convictions is accurately characterized as one of uncritically trusting their religious community. They may acknowledge that unreflective trust of a religious community is unjustified (in light of religious diversity), but insist that the process by which they hold their beliefs is one of critically reflecting on all of the evidence. This evidence includes their personal experience and community’s experience, to be sure, but also testimonial evidence from other communities, scientific evidence, and philosophical considerations. Kitcher anticipates a response along these lines, but insists that even when we confine our focus to reflective and philosophically sophisticated religious believers, we still find a substantial amount of controversy, and for this reason he thinks that even philosophically reflective religious belief is defeated by disagreement (9-10). What is unclear, however, is why Kitcher thinks that an irreligious secular outlook can avoid epistemic defeat when the process that presumably accounts for his secular convictions—namely, the process of critical philosophical examination of all the relevant evidence—is a process that appears to lead many thinkers to conclusions that are incompatible with his secularism. If one insists that religious disagreement defeats even reflective religious belief, it will be difficult to maintain that explicitly irreligious belief is not similarly threatened (Bogardus 2013a, 390).

3. Permissivist Responses to the Conciliatory Argument

As discussed in the last section, the conciliatory views that lie behind arguments for disagreement-based religious skepticism can often be understood as consisting of two commitments: a commitment to a principle like DEFERENCE that requires epistemic deference to apparently qualified interlocutors, and a commitment to a principle like INDEPENDENCE that prohibits a question-begging assessment of epistemic qualifications. While many responses to arguments for disagreement-based religious skepticism take issue with INDEPENDENCE, some target DEFERENCE. These responses are the focus of this section.

Critics of DEFERENCE maintain that its plausibility depends on an unacceptably restrictive conception of rationality according to which a given body of evidence rationalizes at most one doxastic attitude towards any given proposition (Schoenfield 2014). On this restrictive picture, if two agents A and B have exactly the same evidence bearing on p and are both perfectly rational in responding to that evidence, then A and B will have the same view on p’s plausibility. This thesis is frequently called the “uniqueness thesis” (Feldman 2007), since it holds that there is a uniquely rational doxastic response to any particular body of evidence. Critics of DEFERENCE deny uniqueness and maintain that, in at least some contexts, there is no single response to a given body of evidence that is maximally rational. Religious questions are often cited as one context where rationality is “permissive” in this way. Surely, these “permissivists” maintain, there is no single credence for, say, God’s existence that stands alone as the maximally rational response to a given body of evidence.

The permissivist objection to the applicability of DEFERENCE in religious disputes thus consists of two claims: (i) DEFERENCE applies in contexts of religious disagreement only if such contexts are rationally impermissive (such that there is a unique doxastic response that is fully rational); and (ii) many religious disagreements are contexts where rationality is permissive.

Here is one way of motivating the first claim. Suppose that Al knows that Beth possesses more or less the same evidence as him concerning religious matters and that she is epistemically impeccable. Presumably, the discovery that Beth rejects Al’s religious views should lead Al to worry about his religious views only if this discovery gives Al reason to suspect that his view is not a fully rational response to his (pre-disagreement) evidence. Furthermore, Beth’s contrary religious viewpoint gives Al a good reason to suspect such irrationality only if it cannot be the case that there are multiple contrary religious viewpoints that are each a fully rational response to their evidence. In other words, the disagreement gives Al a good reason to question the rationality of his initial view only if their religious dispute is a context where rationality is impermissive. If full rationality permits a variety of religious perspectives in response to the same evidence, then religious disagreement does not raise worries about the rationality of one’s pre-disagreement religious views and the epistemic deference commended by DEFERENCE would seem to be unmotivated.

It is controversial whether DEFERENCE depends for its motivation on a non-permissivist conception of rationality as the above argument maintains. While advocates of conciliatory views do frequently characterize the worry raised by disagreement as a worry about the rationality of one’s pre-disagreement position, this need not be the only concern raised by disagreement (Christensen 2014). Even if Al knew that his religious reasoning is perfectly rational, Beth’s disagreement could still raise a different sort of worry: Beth’s disagreement might constitute evidence that rational reflection on religious questions does not reliably lead to true religious beliefs. And the knowledge that the rational formation of one’s religious views does not reliably conduce to true belief arguably gives Al a defeater for his religious views, even if Al knows that, prior to learning of the disagreement, his views were fully rational. Of course, if almost all rational people agreed with Al and only a few with Beth, Al might be able to affirm that rational reflection on religious matters does reliably lead to the truth, and perhaps he could be untroubled by the fact that in Beth and a few others, genuinely rational reflection has led to false religious views. (Beth, being in the small minority, could not be similarly sanguine.) But if the number of apparently rational thinkers who are as informed as Al and yet disagree with him rivals the number who agree with him, then religious disagreement would supply evidence of the unreliability of rational religious reflection and may on that account defeat confident religious belief.

Supposing that DEFERENCE does depend on a non-permissive conception of rationality, despite the preceding reflections, is it plausible to maintain that rationality is permissive with respect to many religious questions? It seems fairly clear that there are contexts where rationality is not permissive. For example, someone’s credence that they will win a particular lottery ought to conform to the mathematical odds (absent any reason to suspect supernatural intervention or corrupt lottery officials). But many philosophers find it implausible to suppose that the requirements of rationality are equally precise in domains of inquiry like religion. The types of evidence and rational standards that govern views on the reality of an afterlife, for example, seem too coarse-grained to admit of a precise credence that is maximally rational, or even a maximally rational credence range with precise endpoints. (For a vigorous defense of the uniqueness thesis, see White [2005].) Also, even if we are concerned not with credences but with the coarse-grained doxastic attitudes of belief, disbelief, and withholding (neither believing nor disbelieving), it seems implausible to suppose that there are no borderline cases where either of two attitudes (for example, belief or withholding) could be fully rational.

Even if there are good reasons for thinking that rationality is permissive in religious contexts, it is not clear that an appeal to permissive rationality can defuse worries raised by religious disagreement. First, the affirmation that rationality permits fundamentally opposed religious perspectives appears to be incompatible with certain religious perspectives. The apostle Paul, for instance, asserts that creation provides evidence of God’s eternal power and divine nature that is plain to all, and that the wicked who turn away from God “suppress the truth” (Romans 1.18ff). Second, even if permissivism is correct and religiously acceptable, questions may be raised about just how permissive rationality is. Perhaps weak belief in the reality of an afterlife as well as agnosticism on the question could both be fully rational responses to a given body of evidence. But could confident belief as well as confident disbelief in the afterlife both be fully rational responses to a given body of evidence? An extreme permissivist view that answers this question in the affirmative is significantly more controversial than permissivism itself.

Because it is not clear how permissive rationality is, if indeed it is permissive, with respect to religious questions, it is not clear what degree of religious disagreement among those with similar evidence is required to indicate likely irrationality on the part of at least one of the parties to the disagreement. But religious disagreement is notable for being so extreme. Many Christians, for example, are utterly convinced that God raised Jesus from the dead; on the contrary, many atheists think that theism, not to mention Jesus’ resurrection, is fanciful nonsense that can be dismissed out of hand. Perhaps no other domain of inquiry exhibits this degree of doxastic polarization. Those who appeal to permissivism in order to defuse worries raised by religious disagreement must therefore affirm a very strong form of permissivism according to which rationality radically underdetermines the appropriate response to a given body of evidence. Even philosophers who are inclined towards permissivism may find such an extreme form of the view unpalatable and implausible.

4. Religious Belief and the Problem of Judging Epistemic Credentials

If DEFERENCE is correct, despite the permissivist challenge just considered, then the religious views of apparent epistemic peers or epistemic superiors on religious matters ought to be accorded significant weight. But how are we to determine who our epistemic peers and superiors are? Asked differently, how are we to assess epistemic credentials? As discussed in section 2, many affirm some principle like INDEPENDENCE and maintain that epistemic credentials ought to be assessed in a dispute-independent manner. The fact that INDEPENDENCE helps to explain the intuitive verdict in the calculation case discussed above does lend it some plausibility. But as already noted, some proponents of conciliatory theories deny that we are always required to rely only (or even primarily) on dispute-independent reasons in responding to disagreement. Thus, even if INDEPENDENCE is on the right track, there may be features of religious disagreements that distinguish them from the calculation case and that weaken or render inapplicable the anti-question-begging requirement that applies in the calculation case.

One potentially significant difference between religious disagreements and the calculation case (and similar cases that are used to motivate INDEPENDENCE) is that in many religious disagreements, there is no clear basis for arriving at a dispute-independent judgment concerning the epistemic qualifications of the parties to the dispute (Pittard 2014). In the calculation case, the robust track record information provides a good dispute-independent basis for estimating the reliability of each friend in answering questions like the one under dispute. But consider a dispute between, say, a theist and an atheist. What nonpartisan, dispute-independent grounds do the disputants have for arriving at an estimation of their epistemic credentials concerning the question of God’s existence? One might think that they should compare their track record on other religious questions: for example, whether a relationship with God would be a great good, whether the sorts of suffering we observe in this world could be redeemed by God (should God exist), or whether there are plausible naturalistic and non-teleological explanations for the existence and character of our universe. However, it is quite clear that this procedure is unlikely to yield a nonpartisan assessment of their respective epistemic credentials. The atheist and theist will probably disagree on these questions as well, for reasons that are not independent of their dispute concerning theism, preventing them from arriving at a dispute-independent calculation of their “religious track record.”

If religious track records cannot provide the atheist and the theist with a basis for a nonpartisan assessment of epistemic credentials, one might think that they can arrive at such an assessment by considering the degree to which they each exhibit the intellectual capacities and epistemic advantages that are most important for a reliable assessment of religious claims. For example, they could estimate one another’s intelligence and analytic sophistication by means of some indicator like academic performance, and through conversation they could perhaps ascertain how extensively each of them has studied topics relevant to an assessment of theism. Unfortunately, in a wide range of religious disputes, this sort of procedure is unlikely to deliver a dispute-neutral assessment of epistemic credentials. This is because many systems of religious belief include incompatible views on what qualifies one to reliably assess religious claims. In this respect, religious disagreement is quite different from controversies in many other domains. Two civil engineers with opposing views on the merits of some bridge proposal will most likely agree on what sort of training and cognitive capacities are required to be a good judge of engineering questions, and they probably agree on which institutional signals (for example, academic degrees, professional experience, publications) serve as reliable evidence that someone possesses the requisite capacities. In many religious disputes, however, whether the disputed proposition is true or false has significant implications for the question of which qualifications best position one to assess the disputed proposition. Some Buddhists, for example, maintain that meditative disciplines are required in order to loosen the grip of certain delusions and to enable an adequate appreciation of the truth of Buddhist teachings concerning the non-existence of a personal self. Those who have considered Buddhism and who are not convinced are unlikely to accept that these meditative disciplines are an important qualification for an assessment of Buddhist claims. To consider another example, a Christian, inspired by the apostle Paul’s writings in I Corinthians 1-2, might affirm that scholarly credentials and analytic sophistication do not help one to see the truth of the Christian message, but that the key qualification is the possession of a divinely-given insight into the beauty and excellence of God as portrayed in the Christian message. Non-Christians will clearly not share this view concerning which qualifications are most important.

In many religious disputes, then, questions about which qualifications are most important cannot be separated from the primary religious matter under dispute, so that there is no shared theory of epistemic credentials that could ground a dispute-independent assessment of the disputants’ qualifications. If Christensen’s moderate conciliatory position is right and significant conciliation is required only when one has positive dispute-independent reasons for trusting the other side, and if in many religious disagreements there is no basis for a dispute-independent assessment of epistemic qualifications since questions about which credentials are relevant are caught up in the dispute at hand, then it seems that the correct conciliatory view may not require significant conciliation in many religious disputes.

Against this conclusion, one might protest that even if there is no nonpartisan theory of epistemic credentials that one can employ for a dispute-independent assessment of epistemic qualifications, it is quite probable that one’s own partisan view on epistemic credentials will give one reason to trust the other side. And if that is the case, then surely conciliation will be required. Suppose that atheists maintain that the most significant qualification in assessing theism is the possession of philosophical aptitude, and that theists maintain that the most significant qualification is a selfless love for others, which they think properly disposes the heart to see the truth of “divine things.” While there is no dispute-neutral theory of epistemic credentials in this case, it is certainly possible that the atheists’ own theory will give them a reason to assign significant weight to the views of theists if there are numerous theists who are philosophically qualified, and that the theists’ own theory will give them a reason to assign significant weight to the views of the atheists if atheists exhibit just as much selfless love as theists. In this case, both sides would, by their own light, have reason to significantly reduce confidence in their respective views. In fact, we could say that both sides do have a dispute-independent reason for trusting the other side, the reason being that on either of the competing theories concerning which credentials are most relevant, there is reason to think the other side highly qualified.

As the above rejoinder shows, the mere lack of a common perspective on the relevant epistemic credentials is not enough to escape the threat posed by disagreement, even given a more moderate conciliatory view like Christensen’s. Conflicting theories of epistemic credentials will alleviate the worries posed by disagreement only if one’s partisan theory of epistemic credentials does not give one strong reason to trust the other side. Is there any reason to think that a theory of epistemic credentials that is part of some religious belief system will not supply strong reasons for thinking that adherents of other belief systems are epistemically qualified? This is, ultimately, an empirical matter that must be settled on a case by case basis: what does a given religious viewpoint say about which epistemic credentials are most important when it comes to religious matters? Does the theory of epistemic credentials implied by the religious perspective give strong reasons for thinking that many of those who reject the religious perspective in question are nonetheless epistemically qualified? Clearly, the answers to these questions could vary depending on which religious perspective we are inquiring about. Pittard (2014) gives some reasons to think that, in many cases at least, religiously-motivated theories of epistemic credentials will not supply strong reasons for thinking that those who reject the viewpoint in question are epistemically qualified. First, the credentials that are emphasized by religious traditions are often credentials the possession of which is not easily discernible. Taking inspiration from Jesus’ sermon on the mount, suppose that “purity of heart,” that is, untainted desire for God, is necessary in order to see the truth of divine things. Unlike more standard epistemic credentials that are relevant in mundane domains of inquiry, purity of heart is not something whose presence in one’s disputant can easily be confirmed or disconfirmed. And if the most important epistemic credentials pertaining to religious questions are unobservable, then one may not have very strong reasons for thinking that one’s disputant is qualified with respect to religious matters. Second, many systems of religious belief feature credentials that are unlikely to be possessed by someone who is not disposed to accept the belief system in question. Consider a Theravada Buddhist who maintains that the truth of “emptiness” is unlikely to be evident apart from substantial engagement in Buddhist meditation. While it is perhaps easy to confirm whether or not someone has practiced Buddhist meditative practices in a disciplined way, it is unlikely that someone would pursue years of Buddhist meditation unless she was already positively disposed towards Buddhism. When the putative epistemic credentials are self-selecting in this way, it is less likely that there will be large numbers of disbelievers who possess the credentials.

If (i) a dispute-independent evaluation does not provide strong reasons for thinking that the other side of a religious dispute is as credentialed as one’s own side, (ii) one’s own partisan theory of religious epistemic credentials also does not supply such a reason, and (iii) significant conciliation is required in disagreements only to the extent that one has strong reasons for thinking that the qualifications of those on the other side of the dispute rival or surpass the qualifications of one’s own side, as Christensen asserts, then the skeptical implications of religious disagreement may be quite limited.

Against this line of thinking, some have complained that a view on disagreement is too weak if it allows religious believers to set aside worries raised by disagreement simply because their religiously-motivated theory of epistemic credentials does not give them reason to highly estimate the credentials of their disputants. Lackey (2014, 308), for example, notes that we should not affirm the reasonableness of the sexist who dismisses disagreement-related worries on the grounds that his disputant is a woman. Similarly, she insists that one should not be able to escape worries raised by religious disagreement simply by affirming a partisan and contestable view on the nature of the relevant epistemic credentials. In response, one could point out that while the sexist’s position after dismissing his female disputant is highly unreasonable, this is compatible with its being the case that he applied the correct policy for responding to disagreements. The unreasonableness of his final position may be explained by the unreasonableness of the sexist views he held before the dispute, and not by the employment of an incorrect disagreement norm. After all, we should not expect that applying the right disagreement norm will correct for rational failures that one brings into a disagreement situation. Lackey considers this response and answers as follows: “If an atheist sticks to her guns with respect to her belief that God does not exist just by regarding the theist as her epistemic inferior, this is irrationality in her response to a disagreement. It is not clear what could justify relegating these failures of rationality to epistemology generally rather than to the epistemology of disagreement in particular” (311).

What follows if Lackey’s more expansive conception of the epistemology of disagreement is granted? Perhaps the correct disagreement norm will still allow that the significance of religious disagreement is sensitive to one’s theory of epistemic credentials, but with the added caveat that one’s theory of epistemic credentials can mitigate the worries raised by disagreement only if one’s adherence to the theory is reasonable and not just an unmotivated attempt to block disagreement worries. It isn’t clear how this changes the dialectical situation, since adherents of a particular religiously-motivated theory of epistemic credentials presumably think that their theory is reasonable, and thus not analogous to the prejudice of the sexist. On the other hand, the correct disagreement norm could deny that the evidential significance of religious disagreement is sensitive to what theory of epistemic credentials one happens to hold. One way to do this would be for the disagreement norm to simply stipulate the correct theory of epistemic credentials. But this would require taking a stand on questions that are contested on religious grounds. The resultant norm could not supply a religiously neutral motivation for religious skepticism. Alternatively, the norm could require that one’s assessment of a disagreement always be dispute-neutral, and that equal weight be assigned to both sides in those cases where there is no agreement on the relevant credentials. But such a strong conciliatory norm would require capitulation in disagreements with radical skeptics, which is what led Christensen and others to search for principled conciliatory policies with more modest anti-question-begging constraints. In short, it is not clear whether there is a conciliatory norm that is religiously neutral and not overly skeptical, but that completely forbids relying on one’s particular theory of epistemic credentials in assessing the significance of a religious disagreement.

It should be emphasized that a moderate conciliatory view like Christensen’s will require reduction of confidence in many religious disputes, even if it does not require significant conciliation in inter-religious disputes where the two sides share very little common ground. Significant doxastic revision will likely be required in a wide range of religious disputes between those with broadly similar positions. Consider a disagreement between two theologians who disagree over the finer details of some shared theological framework. Given their extensive theological agreement, each party to the dispute has strong dispute-independent reasons for thinking that the other person is quite reliable as a guide to theological matters. This suggests that a moderate conciliatory framework of the sort considered here would call for significant deference. So even if outright religious skepticism is not required, believers might be required to loosen their religious views by adopting an agnostic stance towards many intramural disputes.

5. Fundamental Versus Superficial Disagreements

In philosophical discussions of disagreement, one frequently encounters the view that fundamental disagreements—that is, disagreements driven by incompatible epistemic starting points—should occasion less doxastic revision than disagreements that are superficial. Many who readily concede that disagreement can easily defeat one’s belief about the answer to a multistep math problem, for example, deny that one’s fundamental moral, philosophical, or religious convictions are similarly vulnerable in the face of disagreement. The previous section pointed to one reason that arguably goes some way towards explaining why fundamental disagreements might be less worrying than superficial ones: it might be that in fundamental disagreements, it is unclear what the relevant epistemic credentials are and who possesses them, making it unlikely that one will have strong independent grounds for thinking that the epistemic credentials of those on the other side of a dispute either rival or surpass the credentials of one’s own side. This section briefly considers two different accounts as to why religious disagreements that are suitably fundamental will pose less of a skeptical threat, and then considers whether religious disagreements are fundamental in the relevant sense.

Bogardus (2013b) argues that while peer disagreement undermines what he calls “knowledge from reports,” it does not undermine “knowledge from direct acquaintance.” Knowledge from reports, according to Bogardus, is mediated knowledge that rests on the output of some cognitive faculty, while knowledge from direct acquaintance involves “immediate and unproblematic access” (9) to the truth of the known proposition. In a case of knowledge that p from direct acquaintance, one “just sees” that p is the case, and p is part of one’s evidence base. Bogardus cites our knowledge that 2+2=4 as a paradigmatic example of such knowledge. In a case of knowledge that p from a report, one does not “see” p directly but sees p by seeing q, where q is some proposition concerning the report of one or more cognitive faculties. In this case, q but not p is part of one’s evidence. A paradigmatic example of knowledge from reports would be a belief based on memory. Christensen’s bill calculation case also seems to be a case where something known from a report is the subject of peer disagreement. When one of the friends concludes that each person’s share is $43, he does not “just see” that $43 is the correct answer. Rather, what he “just sees” is that the answer he has reached after a series of calculative steps (many of which he probably does not remember) is $43, and this is the basis for his belief that each person’s share is $43.

Assuming that there are these two types of knowledge, it is not implausible to think that knowledge from direct acquaintance is less susceptible to higher-order defeat than knowledge from reports. Because knowledge from reports involves trusting the “readouts” of one’s “cognitive instrument,” such knowledge is understandably threatened by worries raised about the reliability of that instrument or by the fact that some other similar instrument–an epistemic peer–delivers an inconsistent “readout.” Knowledge by direct acquaintance, on the other hand, is more fundamental to one’s cognitive perspective in that it is not mediated by instrumental reports. If such knowledge is not based on the report of one’s cognitive faculties, that knowledge may not be similarly undercut when one learns that an epistemic peer’s faculties deliver an inconsistent report. Therefore, on Bogardus’ view, if a contested religious belief is known by direct acquaintance, or if a religious belief is based on some contested proposition that is known by direct acquaintance, then the party who enjoys such knowledge rationally ought to stand by the belief in the face of disagreement.

A second account as to why fundamental disagreements may pose less of a skeptical threat comes from Gellman (1993, 355ff.). Gellman argues that religious beliefs may be immune to defeat by disagreement if those beliefs are numbered among the “rock bottom” epistemological starting points that supply the basis for epistemic evaluation of other beliefs. However religious believers may have come to initially acquire their religious beliefs, for many believers these beliefs come to achieve rock bottom status, alongside other commitments, such as basic rational principles and fundamental beliefs about the world, that serve as justifiers of other beliefs and that do not themselves stand in need of grounding. Gellman acknowledges that there is a hierarchy among such rock-bottom beliefs: some of these beliefs are given more weight in rational deliberation, and some are given priority in that they invariably trump other rock-bottom commitments in cases when they conflict. He also holds that for many religious believers, core religious beliefs are hierarchically prior to many of the rational norms identified by epistemologists, including norms like DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE described above. Given this priority, Gellman maintains that it would not be rational for the religious believer to abandon core religious beliefs just because this is what DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE require.

It is, of course, questionable whether the above thinkers are right in thinking that beliefs that are suitably fundamental are thereby protected from the disagreement threat. Many will question the Cartesian optimism implicit in Bogardus’ conception of knowledge from direct acquaintance. And even if there are fundamental beliefs that are presumed “innocent” and that therefore do not stand in need of evidential support, as Gellman claims, it need not follow that such presumptive innocence remains intact in the face of direct challenge from other qualified thinkers. Finally, even if the significance of disagreement is mitigated in fundamental disputes, it may be that neither Bogardus nor Gellman have adequately articulated the relevant sense of “fundamentality.”

Even once the relevant sense of fundamentality is fully clarified, the question of whether a given religious disagreement is fundamental will in many cases be a controversial one. This is because there is significant disagreement among philosophers of religion on the place that religious belief occupies in the believer’s “noetic structure,” and thus on the source of religious disagreement. Consider, for instance, the conflicting accounts of reflective theistic belief developed by Richard Swinburne (2004) and Alvin Plantinga (2000). Swinburne maintains that reflective theists who are aware of evidential challenges to religious faith, including facts about religious diversity, will typically be unable to take their theistic convictions for granted, but will need to proportion their credence in theism to the evidence. Swinburne holds, moreover, that evidential reasoning about God’s existence can and should employ the same principles of confirmation theory that are widely accepted in the sciences, and that the pre-evidential probabilities that serve as the starting point for such reasoning can and should be sufficiently determined by the application of generally-accepted inductive criteria such as explanatory scope and simplicity. This view seems to suggest that when two equally informed thinkers disagree on the plausibility of theism, the most plausible explanation is that at least one of them has made some mistake in the application of agreed-upon criteria that serve as the epistemic starting points for both parties. If this is right, then there is some reason to think that cases of religious disagreement can be assimilated to the calculation case discussed above, a case of disagreement that seems not to be fundamental since the dispute stems from performance error on the part of one of the thinkers rather than from any fundamental divergence in the disputants’ perspectives antecedent to the process of calculation.

In contrast to Swinburne, Plantinga maintains that for most theists, the belief in God is not the product of inference, but is basic in that it is not based on other beliefs. Plantinga acknowledges that theistic beliefs are often prompted by certain experiences: upon viewing a breathtaking mountain vista, one might find oneself believing that the world was created by God; or after doing some evil act, one might find oneself believing that God disapproves of what one has done. According to Plantinga, however, while these experiences may occasion theistic beliefs, these beliefs are not based on inferential reasoning that appeals to facts about these experiences as evidence. Instead, these beliefs are like the belief in other minds or the reality of the past or in the reliability of memory: such beliefs are held with a high degree of confidence whether or not we are aware of any good arguments in their favor. If Plantinga is right that theistic belief is not typically grounded in evidential reasoning, then there is reason to think that disagreements between theists and atheists are typically fundamental in a way that the disagreement in the calculation case is not. Disagreements over theism would not result from some performance error in inferential reasoning, but would be the product of differences in the basic outlooks of different thinkers.

The aim in comparing Swinburne and Plantinga is not to suggest that if Plantinga is right, theistic belief is fundamental in a way that lessens its vulnerability to defeat by disagreement (or that, if Swinburne is right, theistic belief is more vulnerable to the disagreement threat). While this is a conclusion that some have drawn, the principal aim of the comparison is to show that even if we agreed on a characterization of “fundamentality” that protects beliefs from being defeated by disagreement, there may very well be disagreement concerning the structure of religious belief and the question of whether it is fundamental in the relevant sense. While there is some reason for thinking that Swinburne’s view of theistic belief would place theistic belief on the non-fundamental side, there are also considerations that call this supposition into question. There are potentially significant disanalogies between theistic belief on Swinburne’s picture and the calculation case, which does seem to be a paradigm of a superficial disagreement. For example, in the calculation case, the several steps that led to one’s answer are presumably forgotten, and the exact source of the disagreement cannot be pinpointed. (And if it could be pinpointed, no doubt one party would recognize their error.) One might think that in many religious disagreements, disputants can rehearse the most important steps of the reasoning that grounds their view, and that as a result they can locate the precise point where their reasoning diverges. And a disagreement that persists even when the point of divergence has been identified is quite different from one where the disagreement persists precisely because the two parties cannot reconstruct their reasoning and thus cannot identify the point of divergence. The former sort of disagreement, which is driven by stable differences in how one applies inferential norms, is perhaps fundamental in a way that the calculation disagreement, which results from some obscured performance error, is not.

In addition to questioning whether Swinburne’s picture supports the “non-fundamental” characterization of religious disagreement, there is also room to question whether religious disagreement on Plantinga’s picture really does qualify as fundamental in the relevant sense. While Plantinga maintains that theistic belief is basic, one might argue that on his model theistic belief is an instance of knowledge from reports rather than knowledge from direct acquaintance. Even if theistic belief is not inferred from facts about the report of some cognitive faculty, the believer may believe in response to a report from some cognitive faculty (what Plantinga calls the sensus divinitatis) and may not “just see” that God exists. Consider: basic perceptual beliefs seem susceptible to defeat by disagreement in a way that basic mathematical beliefs are not. If two normal and (up till now) healthy friends are standing before an open garage, and one says he sees a car in the garage and the other says the garage is empty, it is reasonable to suppose that both of them should significantly lower their confidence in their initial belief, since it is likely that someone is hallucinating and neither has reason to think that their friend is more susceptible to hallucination than they are. However, if these two friends are talking and it comes to light that one of them believes that 1+1=2 while the other believes that 1+1=5, it is less plausible to suppose that the friend with the correct belief should reduce confidence to any significant extent. Both of these disagreements arguably involve conflicts between basic beliefs, but basic perceptual beliefs appear to be more vulnerable to defeat than basic mathematical beliefs. Perhaps this is because basic mathematical beliefs arise from a direct awareness of mathematical truths, while perceptual beliefs are mediated by the reports of perceptual faculties. This diagnosis and the preceding discussion involve a number of controversial claims and assumptions, controversies that will not be pursued here. The main point is that from the position that theistic belief is basic, it does not straightforwardly follow that theistic belief is among those beliefs that can plausibly be said to be resistant to defeat by disagreement in virtue of their fundamental status. The relevantly fundamental beliefs may be some subclass of basic beliefs, those that are the product of rational insight rather than the product of some perceptual or quasi-perceptual faculty.

6. Appeals to Religious Experience

For many religious believers, personal religious experience plays a crucial role in the formation, development, and sustaining of religious belief. Theravada Buddhists emphasize the importance of experiences arising from certain meditative disciplines, experiences that open the mind to the truth of certain Buddhist teachings. Charismatic Christians frequently refer to certain bodily sensations that serve as experiential signs of the presence and activity of the Holy Spirit. Theists of various stripes emphasize profound experiences of God’s presence and divine communication, experiences that frequently occur in times of prayer or worship but that may also come unbidden outside of any specific religious practice. In addition to claimed direct experience of God, many believers in God or gods purport to discern providential influence on their circumstances, and not infrequently believers claim to have witnessed or received physical healing in response to prayer. This is, of course, only a sample of the diverse religious experiences that are represented in religious traditions across the globe. Atheists who reject any religious viewpoint may also cite personal experiences in accounting for their disbelief—for example, experiences of silence and absence of divine comfort in a season of acute suffering.

The fact that such experiences frequently play a prominent role in motivating and supporting religious belief is potentially significant for an assessment of the epistemic significance of religious disagreement. Many who argue for the defeating power of disagreement are explicitly concerned with contexts where each side to the dispute has fully disclosed the grounds for their view. If disagreement is most worrying when it persists in context of full disclosure, then there is some reason to think that many religious disagreements will not present serious skeptical threats. To be sure, some “religious experiences” are such that their epistemically relevant content can easily be communicated to others. Suppose someone prays for a new car and the next day receives a car from a complete stranger who says that she felt moved to give her car away. The epistemically relevant aspects of such an experience could easily be communicated to others. (Whether the testimony would be believed is, of course, another story.) But one might think that in many instances of what we call “religious experience,” the content of the experience that is taken to be epistemically relevant cannot be communicated. Suppose that someone in desperate straits cries out to God for help and immediately experiences a “peace that surpasses all understanding” (Philippians 4:7), a peace that seems in its profundity to be a divine gift rather than a purely natural phenomenon. Could someone who believes in God partly on the basis of such experience fully disclose his reasons for belief? He could, of course, report having such an experience and describe the belief changes that seemed appropriate in its wake. However, the epistemic significance of the experience may significantly depend on subjective aspects of the experience whose qualities cannot be adequately communicated by means of verbal testimony (James 1902, 371). If this is right, then religious disagreements may be quite different from disagreements in many other domains where the subjective qualities of private experiences do not play a significant epistemic role.

There are reasons for doubting whether the significance of religious experience to religious belief could justify both sides of a religious dispute in confidently maintaining their religious beliefs in the face of disagreement (Schellenberg 2007, 182-3). Consider a disagreement between a Buddhist and a Muslim who both appeal to distinctive sorts of experiences in justifying their contested religious beliefs. While the Muslim does not herself experience the same sort of ineffable experiences that ground the Buddhist’s belief in, say, the doctrine of non-self, the Buddhist can tell the Muslim of his experiences and he can describe the doxastic responses that seem to him appropriate in light of the experiences. If the Muslim trusts the judgment of the Buddhist, then it seems that the Buddhist’s belief in non-self constitutes evidence that his experiences, combined with his other evidence, supply good evidence for the doctrine of non-self. Furthermore, evidence that there is good evidence for p is often itself evidence for p. Hence, the Buddhist’s belief in response to the reported experience may serve as a piece of proxy evidence that stands in for the experience itself. Since this proxy evidence is available to the Muslim, it seems that the incommunicability of the Buddhist’s experience does not prevent that experience from having indirect evidential weight for the Muslim. Of course, a symmetrical story can be told as to why the Muslim’s report of mystical experiences and her doxastic response can serve as proxy evidence that stands in for the experience itself and can be appreciated by the Buddhist. Assuming that both attach comparable weight to their experiences and have responded with equal conviction, there is arguably no reason for either thinker to maintain that his or her own experience should be given more evidential weight than the inaccessible experience of the trustworthy interlocutor. On this view, the inaccessibility of religious experience is unlikely to relieve religious believers of the worries raised by religious disagreement. As long as multiple sides accord significant weight to private experiences, there is a kind of epistemic symmetry that arguably demands a skeptical response.

Still, one might resist the above reasoning by noting, first, that we do not have some metric that we can use to measure and compare the apparent evidential value of various mystical experiences. We communicate the perceived evidential significance of our experience through coarse-grained descriptive language, like “a deep and incredibly profound sense of God’s love” or “a brilliantly clear insight into the unity of all things,” language that is not calibrated in a way that would allow us to make reliable interpersonal comparisons of the significance of different mystical experiences. It is possible that two speakers could both be reasonable in describing their religious experiences as, say, “utterly profound and clarifying” even though one person’s experience was in fact much more profound and clarifying than the other’s. The fact that two people use similarly strong language to describe their experiences is poor evidence that the experiences were comparable in their epistemic import. Of course, this by itself does not give one any reason for thinking that one’s own experience is likely to be more significant than someone else’s similarly-described experience. All the same, consider the case of some religious believer who has had a mystical experience of arresting intensity and profundity, and who attempts to convey the significance of this experience using fairly extreme language, and then discovers that believers from opposing standpoints use similarly extreme language to convey the apparent significance of their own mystical experiences. If the religious believer thinks that it is quite plausible that people would use similarly extreme vocabulary even if their experiences were much less profound and compelling than his own, and if he can easily entertain the possibility of others having less compelling experiences than his own but cannot easily entertain the possibility of others having experiences that are more compelling than his own, then he might be reasonable in believing that his own experience is evidentially more significant than the experiences of his disputants (despite the fact that these experiences are similarly described). According to this reasoning, religious belief that is grounded in surprisingly powerful experiences might be reasonably held in the face of religious disagreement even if multiple sides cite similar “powerful” religious experiences in explaining their view.

7. Faith and Practical Responses to the Problem of Religious Disagreement

Epistemic or “theoretical” rationality is the sort of rationality that is principally exhibited by someone’s beliefs, and the norms of epistemic rationality are concerned with such matters as logical consistency and evidential support. Practical rationality, on the other hand, is the sort of rationality that is principally exhibited by someone’s actions, and the norms of practical rationality are concerned with such matters as the compatibility of one’s various goals and the degree to which one’s actions conduce towards the attainment of those goals. The discussion thus far has proceeded under the assumption that whether religious conviction is rational in light of disagreement is a matter to be settled by the norms of epistemic rather than practical rationality. This assumption is contested by many who maintain that the reasonability of religious belief, or at least of religious faith, is best evaluated from the standpoint of practical rather than (or in addition to) epistemic rationality. According to these thinkers, reasonable religious conviction is often based not on the sort of evidential reasons that bear on the question of whether religious claims are true or probable, but instead on moral, prudential, or existential reasons for thinking that it would be in some way good or valuable to have some particular religious commitment. For example, a theist might believe in God for the reason that belief in God gives her a sense of deep purpose, both for her own life and for the cosmos as a whole, or because it helps her to maintain her moral commitments even when they lead to significant suffering. If religious belief may be rational in light of such practical reasons, and if religious disagreement does not pose a threat to the practical justification of religious belief in the same way that it threatens its epistemic justification, then the claim that religious belief ought to be abandoned on account of religious disagreement is arguably more questionable.

It might seem that practical reasons could make religious convictions rational only if those convictions are based on practical reasons, and religious convictions can be based on practical reasons only if they are voluntary. Many philosophers maintain that beliefs are not voluntary, and for this reason are not evaluable according to the norms of practical rationality. If this is right, then the rationality of religious belief is arguably a matter of epistemic rather than practical rationality. The faith of the religious “believer” may not always be an instance of belief in the conventional sense, however. Of the philosophers who have considered the nature of faith, a good number have argued for a “non-cognitive” conception of faith that does not require outright belief in the propositions that are the object of faith. On Alston’s (1996) view, for example, one may fail to believe a proposition while nonetheless “accepting” it as a matter of faith. Such acceptance is like belief in many respects—one views the world from a standpoint that takes the accepted proposition for granted, and one employs the accepted proposition as a premise in practical reasoning—but acceptance is a voluntary state that does not require believing the proposition or judging it to be more probable than not.

Even if non-cognitivists about faith are wrong and belief is essential to faith, there could still be reasons why religious faith is appropriately evaluated from the standpoint of practical rationality rather than (or in addition to) epistemic rationality. First, some contest the claim that belief is inevitably involuntary. William James (1896), for example, argues that belief is governed by two competing aims (“Believe truth! Shun error!”), and how these aims are prioritized in a given context may be a voluntary matter that helps to determine whether one ends up believing a given claim. Second, even if belief cannot be chosen in the rather direct manner supposed by James, there is little doubt that one can undertake courses of action that may indirectly influence one’s religious beliefs.

Granting that religious faith is responsive to practical reasons, either because it is a voluntary state that does not require belief at all or because religious belief can be directly chosen or indirectly influenced by voluntary means, what implications does this have for the rational significance of religious disagreement? Holley (2013) suggests that if commitment to a religious way of life is valuable, then religious belief will likely be practically rational. For engaging in a religious way of life tends to produce religious beliefs, and the exercise of epistemic discipline that would be required to avoid falling into belief is likely to be incompatible with genuinely entering into the way of life in question. For this reason, Holley maintains that one can be reasonable in persisting in religious belief even if systematic religious disagreement defeats the epistemic justification of religious belief. Just how much erosion of epistemic support can the practical grounds for faith tolerate? The answer is by no means clear. For example, even if one can reasonably accept a proposition for which one has a credence of around 0.5 (a credence that might be insufficient for belief), there still could be non-trivial credence thresholds below which acceptance is not practically rational. If this is right, then the degree to which a given claim enjoys epistemic support is not irrelevant to an assessment of the practical rationality of accepting that claim. Those who argue on Jamesian grounds that belief can be responsive to practical considerations often hold that believed propositions must be judged more probable than not, and that this judgment of probability should be responsive to purely epistemic considerations (Pace 2011). As these examples suggest, the mere fact that practical considerations are relevant to an assessment of religious faith does not mean that the practical rationality of faith can be settled without reference to its epistemic merits.

Even if we agreed that the merits of some religious belief that p should be evaluated according to purely practical criteria that in no way depend on the strength of the epistemic reasons for the belief, it is still possible that knowledge of religious disagreement could constitute a defeater that renders religious belief unreasonable. This is because in addition to disagreements about the truth of various religious truth claims, there is also disagreement concerning the merits of various practical or “pragmatic” arguments for religious belief. This disagreement could undermine the epistemic justification of the beliefs that constitute the practical grounds for religious belief, and one might think that a practical rationale whose epistemic justification has been defeated cannot ground reasonable religious belief. Suppose that Theo believes in God on purely practical grounds. Perhaps Theo believes on the basis of a Kantian argument that concludes that belief in God is important in order to engage in the moral life without despair. Alternatively, perhaps Theo believes for the Kierkegaardian reason that passionate commitment in the face of “objective uncertainty” is the highest form of human existence. Still another possibility, his faith might be a response to the prudential reasoning articulated in Pascal’s “Wager” argument. All of these arguments are the subject of immense controversy. If these arguments must be epistemically justified in order to make it practically rational to have religious faith, then disagreement would threaten to undermine religious faith even if the religious claims that are accepted by faith do not themselves stand in need of epistemic justification. Moreover, several opponents of religious faith offer arguments for the conclusion that religious belief is positively harmful, either to the believer or to society as a whole (Fumerton 2013). Practically rational religious belief arguably requires that one be epistemically justified in rejecting such arguments, but disagreement of the right sort might undercut such justification.

8. Conclusion

Even if individual attempts at characterizing the rational significance of religious disagreement prove controversial, for many thinkers, including many religious believers, the intuition that persistent religious disagreement poses a significant challenge to religious belief is incredibly strong. As this article has attempted to show, clarifying the nature and scope of that challenge requires not only that one resolve various controversial questions in the epistemology of disagreement, but also that one settle difficult questions concerning such matters as the place of religious belief in the noetic structure of religious believers, the epistemic significance of various types of religious experiences, the role played by practical reasons in grounding religious conviction, and the theories of religious epistemic credentials implied by various religious belief systems. Given the complexity of such questions, there is little doubt that the epistemic significance of religious disagreement will remain a topic of lively philosophical dispute.

9. References and Further Reading

Adams, Robert M. 1994. “Religious Disagreements and Doxastic Practices.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 54 (4): 885–90.
Alston, William P. 1991. Perceiving God: The Epistemology of Religious Experience. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Alston, William P. 1996. “Belief, Acceptance, and Religious Faith.” In Faith, Freedom, and Rationality, edited by Jeff Jordan and Daniel Howard-Snyder, 3–27. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
Baldwin, Erik, and Michael Thune. 2008. “The Epistemological Limits of Experience-Based Exclusive Religious Belief.” Religious Studies 44 (04): 445–55.
Basinger, David. 1999. “The Challenge of Religious Diversity: A Middle Ground.” Sophia 38 (1): 41–53.
Basinger, David. 2002. Religious Diversity: A Philosophical Assessment. Aldershot, UK: Ashgate.
Bogardus, Tomas. 2013a. “The Problem of Contingency for Religious Belief.” Faith and Philosophy 30 (4): 371–92.
Bogardus, Tomas. 2013b. “Disagreeing with the (Religious) Skeptic.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 74 (1): 5–17.
Bourget, David, and David Chalmers. 2009. “The PhilPapers Surveys: Results, Analysis, and Discussion.” Accessed August 5, 2015. http://philpapers.org/surveys/.
Christensen, David. 2007. “Epistemology of Disagreement: The Good News.” Philosophical Review 116 (2): 187–217.
Christensen, David. 2009. “Disagreement as Evidence: The Epistemology of Controversy.” Philosophy Compass 4 (5): 756–67.
Christensen, David. 2010. “Higher-Order Evidence.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 81 (1): 185–215.
Christensen, David. 2011. “Disagreement, Question-Begging and Epistemic Self-Criticism.” Philosophers’ Imprint 11 (6): 1–22.
Draper, Paul, and Ryan Nichols. 2013. “Diagnosing Bias in Philosophy of Religion.” Monist 96 (3): 420–46.
Elga, Adam. 2007. “Reflection and Disagreement.” Noûs 41 (3): 478–502.
Everett, Theodore J. 2001. “The Rationality of Science and the Rationality of Faith.” The Journal of Philosophy 98 (1): 19–42.
Feldman, Richard. 2007. “Reasonable Religious Disagreements.” In Philosophers Without Gods: Meditations on Atheism and the Secular Life, edited by Louise M. Antony, 194–214. New York: Oxford University Press.
Frances, Bryan. 2008. “Spirituality, Expertise, and Philosophers.” Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion 1: 44–81.
Fumerton, Richard. 2013. “Epistemic Toleration and the New Atheism.” Midwest Studies In Philosophy 37 (1): 97–108.
Gellman, Jerome. 1993. “Religious Diversity and the Epistemic Justification of Religious Belief:” Faith and Philosophy 10 (3): 345–64.
Gutting, Gary. 1982. Religious Belief and Religious Skepticism. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
Hick, John. 2004. An Interpretation of Religion: Human Responses to the Transcendent. 2nd ed. New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
Holley, David M. 2013. “Religious Disagreements and Epistemic Rationality.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 74: 33–49.
“Ipsos Global @dvisory: Supreme Being(s), the Afterlife and Evolution.” 2015. Ipsos In North America. Ipsos. 2011. Accessed August 6, 2015. http://www.ipsos-na.com/news-polls/pressrelease.aspx?id=5217.
James, William. 1896. The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy. New York: Longmans, Green and Co.
James, William. 1902. The Varieties of Religious Experience. New York: Random House.
Kelly, Thomas. 2005. “The Epistemic Significance of Disagreement.” Oxford Studies in Epistemology 1: 167–96.
Kelly, Thomas. 2011. “Consensus Gentium: Reflections on the ‘Common Consent’ Argument for the Existence of God.” In Evidence and Religious Belief, edited by Kelly James Clark and Raymond J. VanArragon, 135–56. New York: Oxford University Press.
Kelly, Thomas. 2013. “Disagreement and the Burdens of Judgment.” In The Epistemology of Disagreement: New Essays, edited by David Christensen and Jennifer Lackey. Oxford University Press.
King, Nathan L. 2008. “Religious Diversity and Its Challenges to Religious Belief.” Philosophy Compass 3 (4): 830–53.
Kitcher, Philip. 2014. Life After Faith: The Case for Secular Humanism. Yale University Press.
Koehl, Andrew. 2005. “On Blanket Statements About the Epistemic Effects of Religious Diversity.” Religious Studies 41 (04): 395–414.
Lackey, Jennifer. 2014. “Taking Religious Disagreement Seriously.” In Religious Faith and Intellectual Virtue, edited by Laura Frances Callahan and Timothy O’Connor. Oxford University Press.
Lasonen-Aarnio, Maria. 2014. “Higher-Order Evidence and the Limits of Defeat.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 88 (2): 314–45.
McKim, R. 2001. Religious Ambiguity and Religious Diversity. Oxford University Press, USA.
Pace, Michael. 2011. “The Epistemic Value of Moral Considerations: Justification, Moral Encroachment, and James’ ‘Will To Believe.’” Noûs 45 (2): 239–68.
Pittard, John. 2014. “Conciliationism and Religious Disagreement.” In Challenges to Moral and Religious Belief: Disagreement and Evolution, edited by Michael Bergmann and Patrick Kain, 80–97. New York: Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1995. “Pluralism: A Defense of Religious Exclusivism.” In The Rationality of Belief and the Plurality of Faith, edited by Thomas David Senor, 191–215. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 2000. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford University Press.
Quinn, Philip L., and Kevin Meeker. 2000. The Philosophical Challenge of Religious Diversity. New York: Oxford University Press.
Rotondo, Andrew. 2013. “Undermining, Circularity, and Disagreement.” Synthese 190 (3): 563–84.
Schellenberg, J. L. 2007. The Wisdom to Doubt: A Justification of Religious Skepticism. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
Schoenfield, Miriam. 2014. “Permission to Believe: Why Permissivism Is True and What It Tells Us About Irrelevant Influences on Belief.” Noûs 48 (2): 193–218.
Swinburne, Richard. 2005. Faith and Reason. 2nd ed. New York: Oxford University Press.
Thune, Michael. 2010. “Religious Belief and the Epistemology of Disagreement.” Philosophy Compass 5 (8): 712–24.
Thurow, Joshua C. 2012. “Does Religious Disagreement Actually Aid the Case for Theism?” In Probability in the Philosophy of Religion, 209–24. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Titelbaum, Michael G. 2015. “Rationality’s Fixed Point (Or: In Defense of Right Reason).” Oxford Studies in Epistemology 5.
van Inwagen, Peter. 1996. “It Is Wrong, Everywhere, Always, and for Anyone, to Believe Anything upon Insufficient Evidence.” In Faith, Freedom and Rationality: Essays in the Philosophy of Religion, edited by Jeff Jordan and Daniel Howard-Snyder, 137–53. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
Vavova, Katia. 2014. “Moral Disagreement and Moral Skepticism.” Philosophical Perspectives 28 (1): 302–33.
White, Roger. 2005. “Epistemic Permissiveness.” Philosophical Perspectives 19 (1): 445–59.

Author Information

John Pittard
Email: john.pittard@yale.edu
Yale University
U. S. A.

Karl Rahner (1904-1984)

Karl Rahner was one of the most influential Catholic philosophers of the mid to late twentieth century. A member of the Society of Jesus (Jesuits) and a Roman Catholic priest, Rahner, as was the custom of the time, studied scholastic philosophy, through which he discovered Thomas Aquinas. From Aquinas’ epistemology and philosophical psychology Rahner was introduced to the Aristotelian-Thomistic notion of abstraction. This theory holds that human beings, as embodied souls or spirits, directly know only that which is sensed; direct sensory knowledge is physical knowledge. The intellect, through complex actions best described as abstraction, draws from sensory knowledge. This knowledge is indirect but valid knowledge of spiritual or non-physical realities. Thus, Rahner, learning from Thomas, held that it is the abstractive power of the mind that leads to indirect knowledge of the spiritual. Kant led Rahner to the philosophical work of Joseph Maréchal, a fellow Jesuit. Maréchal attempted to use Kant to create a re-vitalized Thomism. Maréchal held that the dynamic of the mind transcends the dichotomy of phenomenon and noumenon by attaining the utter unity of the Absolute. Rahner learned from Maréchal that the Kantian frustration could be overcome by the dynamic of the mind. Finally Rahner learned from Pierre Rousselot, another Jesuit, that the mind’s dynamic is drawn to the Absolute because the Absolute is the pure unity of being and spirit. So from Rousselot, Rahner understands the absolute terminus of the dynamic of mind to be the pure unity of being and spirit. It is from these strands that Rahner weaves his unique philosophical system.

Life
Influences
1. Kant
2. Rousselot
3. Maréchal
4. Heidegger
5. Summary
Rahner’s System
1. Geist in Welt
2. Hšrers des Wortes
Summary
References and Further Reading

1. Life

Karl Rahner was born 5 March 1904 in the university town of Freiburg-im-Breisgau in the then Grand Duchy of Baden, the fourth of seven children. His father Karl was an educator; his mother Luise, a homemaker. Rahner’s mother was pious, but in a healthy sense: the atmosphere of a university town imbued that piety with openness. It can therefore be said that Rahner’s childhood laid the groundwork for his later complex philosophical and theological projects: a pious openness, seeking the most effective formulations to gain insight into the character of the world.

At age eighteen, on 20 April 1922, Karl Rahner entered the novitiate of the Society of Jesus. The Jesuits had been, since their inception, an intellectual religious congregation: among their number were philosophers such as Francisco Suárez; nascent biologists such as Athanasius Kircher, discoverer of microbes; missionary-linguists such as Matteo Ricci; paleontologist Pierre Teilhard de Chardin and cosmologist George LeMa”tre. It was thus the perfect environment in which Rahner might begin to develop his own thought: intellectually rigorous, pioneering, open.

After the completion of novitiate and the taking of vows Rahner entered the scholasticate, the formal program of studies. These studies were founded upon the current Neo-Scholastic manuals, much defamed but actually thorough presentations of Scholastic thought. Rahner was deeply influenced by Aquinas, of course; Aquinas had been mandated by Leo XIII as the Catholic philosopher. At the same time Rahner discovered three of the four major influences that would form his intellectual horizons: Immanuel Kant and fellow Jesuits Pierre Rousselot and Joseph Maréchal. It was, however, Maréchal, and Maréchal’s interpretation of Kant, who became the decisive impetus to Rahner’s ongoing philosophical reflections.

Rahner’s superiors soon noted the caliber of his intellect, and so he was sent to the University of Freiburg in Freiburg-im-Breisgau, his home, to begin doctoral studies in philosophy in 1934: his superiors foresaw for him a university career as a professor of philosophy. It was at Freiburg where Rahner, despite his sincere acknowledgements of the importance of Aquinas, Kant and especially Maréchal, discovered the philosopher whom he would later call his true teacher: Martin Heidegger. Until his death Rahner kept with him the list of courses he had taken with Heidegger. Heideggerian thought became the catalyst through which the transcendental philosophies of Kant, and especially Kant through Maréchal, began to coalesce into the Rahnerian philosophical system. In 1936, Rahner submitted his doctoral thesis, Geist in Welt, usually rendered Spirit in the World, which attempts a radical re-reading of Aquinas through Kant, Maréchal and Heidegger. Geist in Welt was essentially a lengthy gloss on a single question in Thomas’ Summa, an intricate, complicated, tightly woven, and impenetrable Maréchallian-Heideggerian interpretation. It was rejected as being too influenced by Heidegger. That same year Rahner was transferred to Salzburg to study theology, gaining a doctorate there.

Rahner then began his university career in 1937 at the University of Innsbruck. In that same year Rahner gave a series of lectures at Innsbruck; these became the basis for Rahner’s last purely philosophical work, his philosophy of religion and revelation, Hšrers des Wortes (Hearers of the Word).

During the war years and post-war years, 1939-1949, Rahner engaged in pastoral work in Vienna. After the war he returned to Innsbruck in 1949 and began to develop his theological system, a system rooted completely in the metaphysics of Geist in Welt and Hšrers des Wortes: human beings, finite, yet invested by an infinite and inexhaustible epistemological dynamic, are intrinsically open to the revelation of the utter mystery that is God. Thus religion is the thematization of the absolutely unthematic.

While at Innsbruck in 1962 Rahner’s superiors received a monitum from the Holy Office in Rome: Rahner was neither to lecture nor publish without Rome’s explicit permission. The irony: in that same year Pope John XXIII named Rahner a peritus to the Second Vatican Council. Rahner’s influence was profound; it was Rahner who was the principal behind the drafting of Lumen Gentium, The Dogmatic Constitution on the Church. The monitum, obviously, disappeared into bureaucratic oblivion. Rahner taught at Innsbruck until 1964. From 1964 until 1981 Rahner taught at the University of Munich. Rahner retired to Innsbruck, where he died, 30 March 1984. Karl Rahner was, and remains, a powerful influence upon the Roman Catholic Church. Rahner’s philosophy was at once the foundation and framework for his far-reaching and in some ways radically different re-reading of Roman Catholic dogma. It is important to note, however, that Rahner’s philosophical system precedes and is separable from the theological system built upon it.

2. Influences

In summary: Rahner derived the notion of the transcendental structure of knowledge from Kant, and from Rousselot and Maréchal he derived the notion of the infinite dynamic inherent in this transcendental structure. This infinite dynamic possesses an intrinsic inevitability toward the Absolute or God. Because of his exposure to Heidegger’s system of thought, Rahner ultimately came to characterize human beings as utterly finite yet as ever ordered to being.

a. Kant

Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) brought to crescendo the “philosophy of the subject” that had been steadily on the rise from time of the great Scholastics. For Kant an authentic subjectivity, one that at once addressed the real, however unknowable (the noumenal), and from that address structured the known (the phenomenal), was the only answer to the radical skepticism of Hume. It was in response to this skepticism that Kant created his great work, Kritik der Reinen Vernunft (Critique of Pure Reason) in two editions: the first (A) in 1781, the second, greatly expanded edition (B), in 1787. The Kritik was the impetus for Joseph Maréchal to establish Transcendental Thomism, which, in turn, decisively influenced Rahner. This is the central concern of the Kritik: how can one gain certitude? How, in the face of radical skepticism, can one be sure of the world? Simply put, is knowledge possible, and, if so, what is the guarantee of that knowledge? Kant reasoned that the facticity of this or that experience is formed within a grid of pre-determined schemata, and from this application there emerges consistent, verifiable and, thus, dependable knowledge. These schemata are the a priori structures of reason. These a priori structures, the categories, render that which is experienced globally consistent and temporally consistent. The categories, the a priori structures of reason, are therefore frameworks to which the to-be-known must conform to be known. Thus, Kant finds the consistency and dependability of knowledge in the constant a priori schemata or categories proper to reason as reason. Kant was fully satisfied that he had established a lasting guarantee of the certainty of knowledge. Joseph Maréchal, with Heidegger serving as the decisive influence upon Rahner’s philosophical thought, would serve as mediator between Kant and Rahner. It is through Maréchal’s system that transcendental idealism is married to Aquinas’ Aristotelian epistemology. The mind, dynamic in its address of that which is to be known, structures the known through abstraction, but this abstraction is a neo-Kantian impetus to the Absolute or God.

b. Rousselot

Pierre Rousselot (1878-1915) was ordained in England in 1908. Remarkably (and in significant demonstration of his intellectual capabilities) Rousselot completed his theological preparations for ordination while simultaneously earning the customary two doctorates from the Sorbonne in 1908, the year of his ordination: the major thesis, L’intelletualisme de saint Thomas, and the minor thesis, Pour l’historie du problem de l’amour au Moyen Age. In L’intellectualisme Rousselot created an entirely unique Neo-Thomist system, one he styled as a Platonized Thomism. The entire system hinges on the identification of spirit and being in divinity as the very nature of the Godhead. This was an attempt at a defensible interpretation of Thomas. The unity of spirit and being that is God is thus the self-knowing of God as his being: in other words, God is infinite intelligibility utterly transparent in pure self-possession. Rousselot takes this as his model for all forms of knowledge. Rousselot holds that every act of comprehension, of understanding, as the discovery and appreciation of intelligibility, is in fact an affirmation of the existence of the God which is pure intelligibility. From Rousselot, Rahner came to appreciate the identity of spirit and being, and thus the intrinsic intelligibility of all which, when realized in the act of intellection, requires the co-affirmation of the existence of God. Rahner learned from Rousselot that knowing strengthens the relation to the Absolute. For Rahner the mind is an organ of the affirmation of divinity. It was Rousselot who opened Rahner to Maréchal.

c. Maréchal

Maréchal and Heidegger were the decisive influences upon Rahner’s thinking. Joseph Maréchal was a contemporary of Rousseolt, but although there was productive dialogue between the two, Maréchal pursued a deliberately Kantian path. Joseph Maréchal (1878-1944) entered the Society of Jesus in 1895 and while in England during the Great War he began work on his system, explicated in the five volume opus Le Point du Départ de la Métaphysique: Leçons sur le Développment Historique et Théorique du Problème de la Connaissance (henceforward simply Le Point du Départ de la Métaphysique). MMaréchal sought in these five volumes to trace the history of western philosophy and describe what he thought to be the true philosophical system: a Thomism rethought in the light of Kant.

It is the fifth volume of Le Point du Départ de la Métaphysique, titled Le Thomisme devant la Philosophie Critique, that deeply influenced Rahner. Maréchal appreciates Kant’s notion that the mind is an active and dynamic structuring of that which it knows. However, he believes that Kant fails to honor the character of this dynamic. Thus, Maréchal sees the dynamic as twofold. First, it is the dynamic openness of the mind, for the mind seeks to grasp all it encounters. Second, the dynamic of the mind is invested with an intrinsic direction to a specific end. The dynamic of the mind, investing all that can be known, structuring the knowable to the known, is quite literally driven to an end (in Maréchal’s scholastic vocabulary, it is possessed of an irresistible “finality”) which is its ultimate goal. Maréchal argues that Kant does not appreciate the power of mind he has discovered. Maréchal sees that the Kantian transcendental dynamic, the mind structuring the knowable to the known, must ultimately terminate in absolute being. Maréchal holds that the dynamic, searching, structuring character of the mind will structure everything knowable to the known. This Kantian impetus is ultimately rooted in its trajectory toward the absolute, toward the absolute as absolute being in which absolute being is absolute truth. For Maréchal, as for Rousselot, every act of knowing is at once an implicit affirmation of the absolute that is absolute being as absolute truth. Here Rahner found the means to go beyond Kant and give systemic form to Rousseolt’s lyrical Platonized Thomism: Maréchal gave to Rahner the Thomist framework to both appropriate Rousselot’s themes of the identity of spirit and being in the pure intelligibility that is God and the utter dynamic of human knowing grounded in that identity.

d. Heidegger

It was Heidegger who was perhaps the greatest influence on Rahner. It is the marriage of Heidegger’s thinking to that of Maréchal’s that joins Heideggerian finitude as open-ness to being-as-irreducible to the Maréchallian dynamism of knowing intrinsically ordered to the Absolute. This move firmly established the foundation of Rahner’s philosophical system. Martin Heidegger’s (1889-1976) Sein und Zeit is the final and decisive influence on Rahner. Its themes, melded with those of Maréchal, give the cast to Rahner’s thought. The animating principle and overarching motif of Sein und Zeit is being or being at its most irreducible. In it Heidegger seeks to discover, amongst and through and beneath the myriad kinds of beings, that uttermost manner of being-ness that underlies this myriad. To discover this being-most-irreducible it is necessary to seek this being, and it is human beings who seek being-most-irreducible. Heidegger calls this being Dasein: literally, being-there, being-emplaced, being-in-and-of-the-world-of-beings. Dasein puts being-most-irreducible in question when it gives itself over to the mystery that is being-most-irreducible. Dasein becomes the possibility of being-most-irreducible revealed as it is. But how, then, does Dasein in its questioning quest reveal being-most-irreducible? Only in the authenticity of Dasein: being authentic. How does Dasein be-authentically? Through Dasein’s realization of its utter finitude. And how is finitude disclosed to Dasein? When Dasein as being-authentically accepts being-toward-death. The complete acceptance of death, the radical finitude of being, opens Dasein to being-most-irreducible, for radical finitude recognizes that which is most irreducible as the reply to that finitude. Rahner neatly synthesizes Maréchal’s dynamic of mind inevitably ordered to absolute being with Heidegger’s notion of Dasein.

e. Summary

It is through Maréchal that Rahner understands Kant and Maréchal’s notion of the dynamic of mind thrusting to the absolute being. This becomes the core of Rahner’s system. Rousselot provides the inspiration in the identity of spirit and being in knowing, and Heidegger’s thinking brings this together. The dynamic thrust of the knowing mind understands the being-most-irreducible as God and the unity of being and spirit in knowing. God is implicitly and intrinsically affirmed in the dynamic of every act of knowing. Thus, through Maréchal Rahner appropriates the Kantian notion of the transcendental structuring of the known by the mind. Through Rousselot and most especially Maréchal, Rahner sees this structuring of the known as a drive to attain the Absolute or God, and it is through Heidegger that this drive is rooted in radically finite human beings, and he discloses God as the identity of spirit and being.

3. Rahner’s System

Rahner’s system is fully explicated in Geist in Welt. Here the foundation is meticulously and densely established. Rahner’s second work, Hšrers des Wortes, forwards a system whereby the human and the divine are intrinsically ordered one to the other. For Rahner, human being as defined in Geist in Welt is intrinsically open to God or the Absolute. It is necessarily the receptacle of revelation. In Rahner’s view even if God or the Absolute remains utterly silent and completely hidden that silence and hiddenness, are, in fact, revelations.

a. Geist in Welt

Translating Geist in Welt as Spirit in the World demonstrates Rahner’s dense use of language. Geist qua spirit denotes both spirit as the unity of being and spirit as known and knowing in human reason, as demonstrated in the thinking of Rousselot. The preposition in does not simply note location but it is also indicative of a movement-towards; Welt is the Heideggerian welt, the world as the location of Dasein as the arena of the quest for Being-most-irreducible. Geist in Welt is remarkably simple in concept and extraordinarily complex in execution. It takes a single question and a single article from Thomas’ Summa Theologiae (ST) and uses them as the fulcrum to erect the Rahnerian synthesis. The question: ST I, q 84, a 7; seven hundred words devoted to the crux of Thomastic psychology and epistemology become the cornerstone of Rahner’s philosophical system.

Thomas notes that in this life the soul is joined to its body; it is through the physicality of its body that the soul interacts with the world. Thomas, following his master Aristotle, holds that the intellect (mind) cannot directly know what the body senses and perceives. The mind is spirit, the body matter. Keep in mind Thomas is not a dualist like Descartes; soul and body, spirit and matter are united, wholly interactive and completely congruent. However a transition from the sensed and the perceived to the known is necessary for Thomas. This transition occurs within the process of intellection (the process of the mind coming to understanding). Thomas, in a manner reminiscent of Kant, also holds that the mind does not directly know the world. Thomas did not see the mind possessing a priori structures. Rahner introduces a Kantian a priori thematic through Maréchal into Thomas. Thomas sees that there is a meditative structure to knowing and this mediation occurs in the following sequential constellation. The imagination receives the impressions of the experienced from the senses and the imagination creates an image of that which is experienced or the phantasm. The phantasm is received by the active (or agent) intellect, which abstracts from the phantasm the universal(s) proper to the object(s) experienced, and thus contained in the phantasm is this intelligible species. The passive (or possible) intellect receives the intelligible species and renders it to the verbum mentis, the “mind’s word,” which is the achieved comprehension and attained understanding.

So like Kant, Thomas does not believe human beings directly experience the world as it is; unlike Kant, there are no categories to structure the perceived world as understood. Rather there is a complex translation of the perceived (which is of the body) to the understood (which is of the soul). It is important to remember that Thomas insists human beings cannot know through their spiritual essence (here the soul) as do the angels. Human beings are of the world and so all human knowledge is the result of mediation and translation. It is this thematic that Rahner appropriates as the jumping off point of Geist in Welt and it is also this thematic that, through Maréchal and Heidegger, becomes the very core of Rahner’s philosophical system. Rahner begins with the process of abstraction which is the work of the agent intellect upon the phantasm. Rahner, along with Thomas, notes the world is the arena of the metaphysical. It is in and through the world that human beings through their agent intellect encounter and grasp thematically being-most-irreducible and also the unthematically present absolute being, God.

Thus: esse—Thomas’ word for being-most-irreducible—is, via Rahner, now the woauf of the Vorgriff, which is of the agent intellect. Woauf, a compound of prepositions, means: wo, where or how; auf, toward, up to, into. Thus, woauf might be rendered, however ungrammatically, as “potential-toward.” Vorgriff is another Rahnerian coinage: vor means before, previous, ahead; and greifen (from which griff is derived) means seize, grasp, hold or comprehend. Thus the Vorgriff is that prior projectedness to comprehension. Thus esse, grasped by the agent (active) intellect, is the potential toward which the prior projectedness to comprehension is directed. It is the Vorgriff, the projectedness to comprehension (as grasping, seizing), that is key to Rahner’s system. The Vorgriff bounds and compasses being-most-irreducible. It is at once, however, non-objective in this bounding and compassing. The Vorgriff is the condition of all knowing and the Vorgriff, as the bounding and compassing of being-most-irreducible, is a directedness to the absolute being, God, which is the ground of being-most-irreducible.

It is this Vorgriff that is the condition or possibility of the knowing of all objective beings. Indeed, all objective beings, and all possible objects of knowledge, are of the index of being that is the Vorgriff. The passive (possible) intellect is the self-becoming of human beings as knowing beings. Receiving the verbum mentis, which is the appropriation of the endless scope of the Vorgriff of the agent (active) intellect, the passive intellect is therefore the human spirit as identity of being and spirit. The passive intellect realizes through the active intellect the utterness of being-most-irreducible. The passive intellect becomes all beings as rendered knowable by the agent intellect through the Vorgriff. It is the full scope of being as spirit being as known which is the dynamic of the human mind encompassing being-most-irreducible. The human spirit directed toward being-most-irreducible through the Vorgriff as the potential prior-directedness to comprehension of being-as-irreducible. In turn the being-as-irreducible is constituted human as both the identity of spirit and being in the mind knowing all possible beings because it becomes all beings rendered knowable. Through this occurs the revelation of absolute being, God. This is the knowing of absolute being as last-knowable-being but knowable only in its infinitely distant obscurity. Geist in Welt blends the following: 1.) Maréchal: the themes of dynamism; 2.) the co-affirmation of absolute being with the grasp of being-most-irreducible and all possible beings to be known in the act of knowing of the human being; 3.) Heidegger’s themes of being-most-irreducible; 4.) Dasein as unformed and thus the self-constituting embeddedness of human being in the world and 5.) the world and the beings of the world as the means to discover being-most-irreducible.

b. Hšrers des Wortes

In Hšrers des Wortes Rahner restates, more lucidly, his themes from Geist in Welt. Recasting these themes in terms of metaphysics, Rahner notes that metaphysics addresses the question of being as being-most-irreducible. Metaphysics formulates the question to the beingness of beings to being-most-irreducible. The question of the beingness of beings, being-most-irreducible, addresses the ground of this beingness, this being-most-irreducible. These questions arise because of the ultimate unity of being and being-known. Rahner called this unity of being and being known, in another neologism, Bei-sich-sein, being-present-to-itself. Beingness is analogical. There are degrees of being-present-to-itself as the unity of being and being known just as there are degrees of intensity of the self-presence, the unity. God is absolute being and therefore absolute being-present-to-itself. For Rahner God is the absolute unity of being and being-know, the absolute possession of beingness; therefore God is the ground of being-most-irreducible. Human being, through the Vorgriff, constitutes itself as the dynamic self movement of spirit, the identity of being and being-known-to the absolute compass of all possible beings-as-knowable.

This movement requires the co-affirmation of the absolute being, God, as the being characterized by absolute self-possession of being. God as God, the pinnacle of the analogy of being-present-to-itself, is the possibility of the Vorgriff. Thus, human being as spirit is the openness of the finite to god, the absolute infinite. Human being as spirit is the dynamic self-movement of transcendence to absolute being to God, and thus the possibility of the disclosure of this Absolute Being. The absolute being-present-to-itself that is God is correlated to human being as an endlessly dynamic self movement of transcendence and thus the analogy of being-present-to-itself in degrees of self-possession and the degrees of intensity of unities of being and being-known. This absolute transcendence of human being as spirit toward the infinity of beingness as the absolute self-presence of absolute being is the limitless compass of the Vorgriff. In addition, this same Vorgriff is the possibility of the appearance of the limitless God to limited human beings. The Vorgriff is not limitless in itself, but it is limitless in the endless dynamic of spirit. In this endless dynamic is the co-affirmation of absolute being in the limitless compass of the Vorgriff as it addresses all possible beings as knowable. Fundamentally, the Vorgriff is the awaiting of the disclosure of the absolute being present in that dynamism. Therefore, Rahner declares that this self-disclosure is inevitable and even the silence of refusal is disclosure of absolute being.

4. Summary

Rahner’s utterly unique reading of Thomas through Maréchal and Heidegger cost him his doctorate in philosophy at Freiburg. Yet Geist in Welt demonstrates the fecundity of Rahner’s mind. Taking a single question from the Summa and but a single article in that question, Rahner, using medieval epistemological categories, weaves Maréchal, Rousseolt, and Heidegger into a vibrant transcendental synthesis. Other Catholic philosophers remained closer to Maréchal, especially Francophone philosophers. These were the practitioners of Transcendental Thomism. Rahner’s philosophy forwards a unique transcendentalism from Thomism featuring 1.) the Heideggerian rootedness of human being in its world. This comprises the vast field of beings that is the medium through which being-most-irreducible is revealed; being-most-irreducible is the proper fulfillment of human being. 2.) The Rousselotian identity of knowing and being as spirit as the hierarchy of degrees of self-possession. 3.) The Maréchallian themes of the endless dynamism of mind and the intrinsic co-affirmation of absolute being in that dynamism. This is Rahner’s unique synthesis; it demonstrates the power of his mind as synthetic, the uniqueness of his insight to build this edifice on the alien foundation of medieval scholasticism, and the complexity and subtlety of his system-building skill.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Karl Rahner: Primary

Karl Rahner, Geist in Welt, dritte auflage MŸnchen: Kosel, 1941
Karl Rahner, Hšrers des Wortes, zweite auflage MŸnchen: Kosel, 1968
Karl Rahner, Spirit in the World New York: Continuum, 1994
Karl Rahner, Hearer of the Word New York: Continuum, 1994

b. Karl Rahner: Secondary

Patrick Burke, Re-interpreting Rahner: A Critical Study of his Major Themes NY: Fordham, 2002
Stephen Fields, Being as Symbol Washington DC: Georgetown, 2000
Karen Kilby, Karl Rahner: Theology and Philosophy London: Routledge, 2003
Thomas Sheehan, Rahner Athens OH: Ohio University Press, 1987

c. Immanuel Kant: Primary

Immanuel Kant, Kritik der Reinen Vernunft 1 & 2 (Bande III/IV, Werkausgabe in 12 Bande) Berlin: Suhrkamp, 1974

d. Pierre Rousselot: Primary

Pierre Rousselot, L’intellectualisme de St. Thomas 2. ed Paris: Beauchesne, 1908
Pierre Rousselot,The Intellectualism of St Thomas (translated, James Mahoney) New York: Sheed and Ward, 1935
Pierre Rousselot, Intelligence: Sense of Being, Faculty of God (translated, Andrew Tallon) Marquette WI: Marquette University Press, 2002

e. Pierre Rousselot: Secondary

John McDermott, Love and Understanding Rome: Gregorian University, 1983

f. Joseph Maréchal: Primary

Joseph Maréchal, Le Point de Depart de la Metaphysique 5 volumes Paris: Desclee de Brouwer, 1922

g. Joseph Maréchal: Secondary

Anthony M. Matteo, Quest for the Absolute DeKalb IL: Northern Illinois University Press, 1992

h. Martin Heidegger: Primary

Martin Heidegger, Sein und Zeit zehnte auflage Tubingen: Max Niemeyer, 1963
Martin Heidegger, Being and Time (translated, John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson) NY: HarperCollins, 2008

Author Information

Guy Woodward
Email: gwoodward127@gmail.com

U. S. A.

F. H. Bradley: Logic

Although the logical system expounded by F. H. Bradley in The Principles of Logic (1883) is now almost forgotten, it had many virtues. To appreciate them, it is helpful to understand that Bradley had a very different view of logic from that prevalent today. He is hostile to the idea of a purely formal logic. Today, deductive logic is largely restricted to a study of the rules through which we can legitimately re-arrange our thoughts, permitting the elimination of items no longer required, but not allowing the addition of anything genuinely new. Bradley had a much wider conception and took logic to be the discipline through which we give an account and explanation of the special function of thought through which we transcend immediate experience. Bradley believes logic covers topics that would fall today under the heading of theory of knowledge.

For Bradley, the processes of thought through which we transcend immediate experience involve ideas, judgments, and inferences. He begins with judgment and offers a natural account of both relational judgments with more than one subject and judgments without a special subject, such as: “It is raining.” His general theory that the ultimate subject of all judgment is reality as such could also accommodate the mass terms that give modern logicians so much trouble.

Although Bradley accepts the credo of empiricism that all our knowledge begins in experience, he does not accept Hume’s view that our immediate experience is composed by a swarm of impressions. He rejects the theory, widespread at the time, that knowledge could be explained through the association of ideas derived from such impressions. Neither psychological particulars nor any connections among them are the sorts of thing capable of representing anything beyond themselves. Judgment requires “logical” ideas that are universal, not particular.

What most baffles readers is an esoteric doctrine in which Bradley assimilates judgment and inference as processes in which there is a movement of thought from a ground to a conclusion. Unless there is a change, nothing has happened, but any change requires justification, if the inference is to be valid or the judgment true. For the movement of thought to be satisfactory, the ground and justification cannot remain external and must be brought inside. This is achieved to the extent that we can enlarge our system of thought. It may seem that Bradley is now heading to a Hegelian solution in which the completion of the system of thought brings about the identity of Thought and Reality, but Bradley is not prepared to go this far. This is, however, a matter for metaphysics and is beyond the scope of logic.

Biography
Bradley’s Conception of Logic
Judgment
Logical Ideas
Categorical Judgments
Hypothetical Judgments
The Esoteric Doctrine
Other Types of Judgments
1. Negative Judgments
2. Disjunctive Judgments
Other Topics
Judgment: Concluding Remarks
The Nature of Inference
The Association of Ideas
Inductive Inference
Inference: The Inclusive Theory
Inference and Judgment
Formal Logic
Truth and Validity
The Final Doctrine
References and Further Reading
1. Selected works by F. H. Bradley
2. Further Reading

1. Biography

Francis Herbert Bradley was born in 1846 into a very large family that included the celebrated Shakespearean critic, A.C. Bradley. Having studied at Oxford University, F. H. Bradley was awarded in 1870 a Fellowship at Merton College, where he remained until his death in 1924. He was not required to teach and did not do so. The dominant philosophy in England when he came to Oxford was the (kind of) empiricism, originally due to John Locke, whose champion in the nineteenth century was John Stuart Mill. This theory attempted to explain cognition through the association of mental particulars, impressions and ideas, originally introduced into the mind, it was supposed, by external causes. Bradley was implacably opposed to this position and determined to demolish it. He gained assistance in this from his wide reading in German philosophy, but refused to call himself a Hegelian, since he denied the central principle of the identity of Thought and Reality. Nonetheless, he is generally regarded as the central figure in the group of British Idealists in the late nineteenth century.

2. Bradley’s Conception of Logic

The principal source for Bradley’s thoughts about logic is a substantial two-volume work entitled The Principles of Logic, published in Oxford in 1883. A second edition appeared in 1922, in which the original text was supplemented by a large number of additional notes and terminal essays through which Bradley expressed his mature position. (Page references in what follows will be to this second edition.)

Bradley had a very different view of logic from that prevalent today. Today, logic is largely restricted to a study of the rules through which we can legitimately re-arrange our thoughts, permitting the elimination of items no longer required, but not allowing the addition of anything genuinely new. Bradley had a much wider conception and took logic to be the discipline through which we give an account and explanation of the special function of thought through which we transcend immediate experience. Logic, for Bradley, therefore covers topics that would fall today under the heading of theory of knowledge.

The processes of thought were traditionally taken to involve ideas, judgments, and inferences. These topics, however, are very closely connected. One could begin at any point, but Bradley proposes to begin in the middle with the faculty of judgment.

3. Judgment

Bradley’s central definition is as follows: “Judgment proper is the act which refers an ideal content (recognized as such) to a reality beyond the act.” (10) This definition immediately raises two serious questions: (1) What is this ideal content and how is it acquired? (2) What is reality and how is it accessed? These are questions that Bradley tackles in considerable detail. Moreover, the definition commits Bradley to the thesis that the structure of judgment is essentially subject-predicate, “that in every judgment there is a subject of which the ideal content is asserted.” (13) The subject is what is real, and the predicate is the ideal content referred to it: judgment is essentially predication.

This is, of course, to display the form of the act or function of judgment. It does not specify the essential structure of the ideal content, nor does it trap Bradley within the traditional logic of the categorical statement, as Russell believed. Categorical statements involve the combination of two terms—a subject term and a predicate term—with the two terms united by the copula in such a way that the act of combination is the act of judgment. Bradley resists this account on the ground that the ideal complex expressed is the same whether the proposition is asserted or merely entertained. “We may say then, if the copula is a connection which couples a pair of ideas, it falls outside judgment; and, if on the other hand it is the sign of judgment, it does not couple. Or, if it both joined and judged, then judgment at any rate would not be mere joining.” (21) It is not even true that every judgment contains two ideas: on the contrary, it has but one. The ideal content may be as complex as you please: it may be “a complex totality of qualities and relations” (11); but even if we distinguish separate ideas within the complex, it is as a unit that it is referred to reality. When we assert that the wolf eats the lamb, it is the whole complex that is referred beyond the act of judgment, even if we distinguish within it the separate ideas of (at least) the wolf and the lamb.

Because we can distinguish separate objects such as the wolf and the lamb that can function as special subjects, we can draw at the level of logic a distinction between singular judgments that characterize single things and plural judgments in which a number of such things may be related. But even with non-singular judgments, we must assume a unified reality within which various objects are assigned a place.

Bradley’s theory that relational judgments that appear to refer to a number of identifiable and discriminable individuals actually presuppose a single underlying reality gets confirmation from his logical analysis of a kind of judgment in which this reality is introduced directly. This is the kind of judgment that denies the existence of things of a certain type, such as sea-serpents. “Sea-serpents do not exist” has “sea-serpents” as its grammatical subject, but we must distinguish the grammatical subject from the real subject that confers a truth-value upon the statement. Sea-serpents are not the reality to which we refer when making this judgment, since there are no sea-serpents. The correct logical analysis is something like: “Reality is such that it contains no sea-serpents.” This corresponds to: “Reality is such that A and B are simultaneous.” Bradley can therefore handle this kind of judgment without presupposing the existence of what is denied. What he presupposes is the reality that is the ultimate subject of every judgment. The competing analysis offered by modern logic through the negation of existential quantification presupposes a universe of discourse comprising all possible values of the individual variables in the system.

Judgment has a dimension of truth and falsity, and Bradley uses this to confirm his view that judgment necessarily involves a reference to what is real. “For consider;” he says, “a judgment must be true or false, and its truth or falsehood cannot lie in itself. They involve a reference to a something beyond. And this, about which or of which we judge, if it is not fact, what else can it be?” (41) It may be thought that logical truths, said to be true in all possible worlds, are an exception. For Bradley, logical truths, or tautologies, are not true in all possible worlds: they are not true in any possible world. “A bare tautology …is not even so much as a poor truth or a thin truth. It is not a truth in any way, in any sense, or at all.” (Appearance and Reality, Note A, 501.)

4. Logical Ideas

Bradley’s definition of judgment introduces “ideal content.” What is “ideal content” and how is it acquired? Bradley was completely sure that the psychological particulars with which empiricists furnished the mind could not begin to explain judgment, knowledge, and cognition. If such things existed, they certainly could not function as predicates in judgment, since they could not be moved from their place in the mind.

What Bradley had to explain was how we get from psychological ideas, which are mental particulars, to logical ideas, which are universal ideal contents, while preserving the information that the impressions have no doubt acquired from elsewhere. He begins by distinguishing two sides that belong to every psychological idea—its existence as a mental particular and its content. “We perceive both that it is and what it is.” (3) Unlike existence, content can be loosened from its home in the psychological idea and transferred elsewhere—a loosening of content that takes place within the act of judgment. It is not, however, the entire content of the psychological idea that is used in judgment. The original content, he says, is “mutilated.” That the acquisition of ideal content involves abstraction is more clearly appreciated, if we move from the Humean picture of a swarm of distinct impressions arriving together in the mind to the notion of an organic immediate experience with which Bradley is more comfortable. It is clear that the logical ideas used in judgment require the separation of elements within the “sensuous felt mass” presented in immediate experience. Even if we begin, however, with an isolated impression or sense-datum, we must recognize that universals are associated at different levels.

Bradley makes an unsuccessful attempt to explain what he has in mind by using the notion of a symbol. A symbol, such as a particular inscription, has, like everything else, two sides: its existence and its content. But it has also a third side—its meaning or signification. This meaning can be identified with the logical idea used in judgment. The symbol RED has as its meaning exactly what we assign to a variety of objects in the act of judgment. This provides an opening for Frege and those who favor the linguistic turn to slip in an item distinct from any image or psychological idea that may be associated with the word. (The logical idea is, of course, to be identified with what Frege calls the sense of the sign, not the referent.) But the attachment of the idea to the symbol through decision or convention does nothing to explain the connection between the abstract universal and the immediate experience which must be its home. It is only because we can abstract a part of the given content that we obtain the sense that we attach to the sign in the language.

5. Categorical Judgments

a. Universal Judgments

The standard classification of judgments distinguished categorical, hypothetical, and disjunctive. Bradley reduces the universal form of the categorical judgment to a hypothetical form. The universal form does not even guarantee the existence of real things to which we refer. “All trespassers will be prosecuted” is designed to ensure that the subject class remains empty. Thus, “Animals are mortal” becomes “If anything is an animal, then it is mortal.” (47) Bradley admits that he got this from Herbart, and Russell admits, in turn, that he got it from Bradley.

b. Analytic Judgments of Sense

Singular judgments, however, are different. Bradley takes as his example: “I have a toothache.” I and my toothache are both individual, but I describe my condition in general terms as “suffering from toothache.” This example belongs to the first division of singular judgments that he calls “analytic judgments of sense.” “The essence of these is to hold only of the now, and not to transcend the given presentation.” (56) Analytic judgments of sense do not always have a grammatical subject or copula. We may call the cry “Wolf” a warning, but it is also a statement of fact, or is supposed to be. The cry of “Wolf” or “Rain” refers to an undifferentiated present reality. The thought is that a wolf is somewhere and that rain is everywhere, at least everywhere that matters. But there are also singular judgments without grammatical subjects in which we qualify by our idea “but one piece of the present.” (57) One way to do this is by pointing. I point to my dog and say “Asleep.” Bradley rejects the view that the grammatical subject is merely suppressed. Even if a grammatical subject may appear when my judgment is reported.

Bradley identifies a second kind of analytic judgments of sense that do have a grammatical subject. “The ideal content of the predicate is here referred to another idea, which stands as a subject. But in this case, as above, the ultimate subject is no idea, but is the real in presentation. It is this to which the content of both ideas, with their relation, is attributed.” (57) “This bird is yellow” is a typical example. The ideal content “bird”, perhaps aided by a pointing finger, is used to identify the particular object that is the special subject of the judgment.

In addition to analytic judgments of sense in which a real object is introduced through what we would now call a definite description, there are other cases in which a proper name is used, such as “John is asleep.” The name “John” is bestowed to help us identify a particular person. Bradley attacks the view that a proper name has a denotation, but no connotation. The proper name is a sign connected with what it denotes, but I could not identify what it denotes without some descriptive content to help me recognize it.

c. Synthetic Judgments of Sense

The discussion of proper names allows Bradley to move to a second category of singular judgment-synthetic judgments of sense. “Proper names,” he says, “have a meaning that always goes beyond the presentation of the moment.” (61) In using the name of a person, we assume an existence that goes beyond what is available in immediate experience, a reality that appears but is distinct from its appearance. In a synthetic judgment of sense, “we make generally some assertion about that which appears in a space or time that we do not perceive.” (61-2) But how is this possible? How can we make a judgment about a reality that appeared in the past, will appear in the future, or is now over the horizon, if we encounter reality only through presentation in immediate experience? No idea can capture the uniqueness of the day that is last Tuesday. We can form the idea of a certain kind of event: we can form the idea of an extensive history involving as large a sequence of events as you please, but such ideal contents cannot capture the unique past that actually took place, which alone can make the ideas we refer to the past either true or false.

For Bradley, the solution requires a crucial distinction between “this” and “thisness”. Only this day is today. Yesterday was today yesterday, but it is no longer today today. Today is also a particular day distinct from every other day and has its own date. It has its own position in a series of days within which every day is rigidly ordered through the relation of earlier and later. This series of days does not change, even when it is envisaged at different times. It is therefore a universal ideal content, and each day within the series has particularity or “thisness”. After McTaggart, the series has been known as the B-series. This ideal series can be attached to reality, only through the identification of a particular day within it with the reality given in present experience, which will turn that day into “today.” Once this is done, days that come after the day with that date are future days that will be real, and days that come before are past days that were real. This introduces the McTaggart A-series. To explain Bradley’s theory, the unit “day” has been used, although it does not appear in the text and involves an oversimplification, since we cannot identify an entire day with the present of immediate experience. On the other hand, it would be a complete mistake to identify the immediate present with an instant or a moment, imagined as either the end product of the infinite division of a period of time or as the interface between adjacent periods.

Since we cannot introduce a reference to what really happened in the past or will really happen in the future, which synthetic judgments of sense seem to demand, through the construction of even the most complex and extensive ideal content constituting a history of a possible world, how is the feat to be accomplished? Bradley’s solution is that although I can access reality only through a point of contact in immediate present experience, reality is not restricted to its appearance in my experience. The problem of appearance and reality is metaphysical and requires another book; but even at the level of logic it is clear that the identity of reality and what appears in experience is not mandated. “If the real must be ‘this’, must encounter us directly, we cannot conclude that the ‘this’ we take is all the real, or that nothing is real beyond the ‘this’.” (70) Being given in experience is not a quality of reality “in such a sense as to shut up reality within that quality.” (70) An ideal content can be true “because it is predicated of the reality, and unique because it is fixed in relation with immediate perception.” (72) Since immediate perception may involve an experience of change, a fragment of the temporal series may be abstracted and extended indefinitely through an ideal process.

Bradley has one further move to make to introduce the idea of a particular fact. “The idea of particularity implies two elements. We must first have a content qualified by ‘thisness’, and we must add to that content the general idea of reference to the reality.” (77) Without the second element, we have members that are exclusive within the series, “but the whole collection is not unique.” (77) For absolute uniqueness, we require the connection of the series with direct presentation. To think of tomorrow we may require a universal ideal content to connect it with today, but the day we think about is as unique as is today.

6. Hypothetical Judgments

Bradley handled universal judgments by reducing them to hypothetical form, but how can a hypothetical judgment be taken as true, since its antecedent is supposed, but not categorically affirmed? Modern logic evades this problem by treating hypothetical statements as truth-functional, but this evasion has consequences. For Bradley, the hypothetical judgment involves an ideal experiment. “The supposal is treated as if it were real, in order to see how the real behaves when qualified thus in a certain manner.” (86) The connection of the components is what is asserted in the hypothetical judgment, and it is this that has its ground in reality.

Bradley believes that not only are all universal judgments hypothetical, but also that all hypothetical judgments are universal. This may be thought doubtful, since there seem to be exceptions. “If this man has taken that dose, he will be dead in twenty minutes.” (89) This would not be necessarily true of any man who took the dose; but if the judgment is true, there will be some universal connection, even if restricted to the case of that specific man.

Bradley is assuming that the truth of a hypothetical statement must depend on some (possibly) latent feature of reality. Singular judgments, however, appear to connect us more directly with solid fact. The synthetic judgment of sense has its special status as categorical because of its connection with a reality actually given. It therefore depends on the analytic judgment of sense which assigns an ideal content to that given. Bradley has already argued that all universal statements are hypothetical. This is now widely accepted. He now moves to the startling claim that all singular statements are hypothetical, which he recognizes as an “unwelcome conclusion.” (91) Construed as categorical, analytic judgments of sense are all false, because they do not provide the whole truth about what is given in immediate experience, far less the whole truth about reality. This follows from his original story that an ideal content used in judgment is limited to part of the content of the given reality. But to say that the judgment is not the whole truth is not to say that it is not wholly true and hence partly false, even false tout court. Bradley complains that the choice of an ideal content to qualify the immediate given is arbitrary. Arbitrary is too strong, since the choice may very well have a purpose, but even if it were arbitrary, the assignment of universal content to the given reality would be just as true as the choice of any other content from the selection available.

Bradley is suggesting that the loosening of part of the content of the given reality that he introduced earlier as the very essence of thought is doomed to failure in advance. This is why he talks about “mutilation”. But the success or failure of the operation is surely relative to what it is intended to achieve. It is not designed to provide an ideal content that will be a complete characterization of reality as a whole; it has surely a much more limited aim. One idea is that loosening a part of the content is associated with separating out a segment of the given reality that conforms to the concept introduced. Loosening the concept of a dog from what I am given allows me to separate out Fido and perhaps other dogs within my field of view. The analytic judgment of sense that here is a dog would appear to be categorically true. This way of explaining the function of the judgments immediately associated with the loosening of ideal contents would allow Bradley, were he so minded, to make peace with logical systems, such as both Aristotelian and modern logic, that give a central position to the individual object. (This is essentially the problem of “special subjects”, discussed in Campbell: 1967.)

7. The Esoteric Doctrine

We have now come to a parting of the ways. If we accept the truth of analytic judgments of sense, such “judgments that analyze what is given in perception will all be categorical.” (106) Abstract, universal judgments will all be hypothetical. Synthetic judgments “about times and spaces beyond perception” (106) are also categorical, although they require inferences that rely on the universal. Bradley is prepared to allow those who lack the courage to follow him to a more esoteric theory “to remain at a lower point of view.” (106) Bradley, however, proposes a trip to a region where the “distinction between individual and universal, categorical and hypothetical, has been quite broken through.” (106) It is at this higher level that Bradley’s logic becomes so difficult, perhaps impossibly difficult. At the lower point of view, we separate out individual objects that we characterize through universal properties and relations in singular and plural judgments. Bradley begins the move to what is higher (or deeper) with the point that these individual objects are conditioned by the setting in which they are found. They are not unconditioned, but are asserted subject to a condition. What is subject to a condition can be asserted categorically, if the condition is taken as satisfied. Bradley is well aware that conditional and conditioned are not the same. “A thing is conditional on account of a supposal, but on the other hand it is conditioned by a fact.” (99) His argument is that for anything with a setting in space and time, the condition can never be satisfied. To introduce the series of conditions in space and time is to introduce a chain whose last link hangs unsupported in the air. This is a worrying argument, traditionally used to prove that the world must have a beginning in time (perhaps also a First Cause), or else by Kant to vindicate transcendental idealism. The assessment of how far it provides a solid support for what Bradley proposes to build on it will be postponed until 18b.

Rejecting the categorical judgment that assigns an ideal content to the segment of reality from which it has been loosened, Bradley is left with no more than hypothetical judgments. These cannot even be our standard hypothetical judgments that are composites of categorical statements. They are mere husks, connecting adjectives For example, “If lightning, then thundering.” Certainly, hypotheticals that connect adjectives are in a way also categorical, since they affirm a ground of connection in reality. But we have lost our standard hypothetical judgments and are left with mere scraps. Even more baffling is the replacement we are offered for a singular judgment in the higher point of view. “Instead of meaning by ‘Here is a wolf,’ or ‘This tree is green’ that ‘wolf’ and ‘green tree’ are real facts, it must affirm the general connection of wolf with elements in the environment, and of ‘green’ with ‘tree.’” (104)

Bradley offers a further explanation of his “unwelcome conclusion” in Terminal Essay II, which I discuss in 18b and offer a way of escape. In the meantime, he returns from the heights and provides a more mundane account of other kinds of judgment.

8. Other Types of Judgments

a. Negative Judgments

Bradley now turns to negative judgments. Negative judgments, he believes, are more complicated than affirmative, since they must begin with a suggestion that is rejected in the judgment. Moreover, this rejection must depend on the assumption of a positive ground of exclusion, even if what this is may not be known. Negative existential judgments are of particular interest. In “Ghosts do not exist,” the grammatical subject cannot be the real subject; the real subject is the nature of things to which we deny the quality of harboring ghosts. The positive character of reality that excludes ghosts is not, however, determined through the negative judgment. This entails that the same character of the real may exclude a variety of different suggestions. The suggestions excluded have their source in an ideal experiment and not in the nature of reality. The negative judgment affirms that some quality of the real excludes a suggestion, but it does not determine what quality that is. The truth of a negative judgment depends on a quality of the real incompatible with the quality excluded in the judgment. The true quality and the quality assigned in the judgment are thus contraries and not contradictories. The way in which a negative judgment presupposes a quality in what is real that we may not be able to specify may be compared with the way in which a hypothetical judgment presupposes the same kind of quality as grounding its connection. It follows that the negation of a hypothetical judgment would be the rejection of this sort of ground. The mere assertion of the antecedent and the negation of the consequent is indeed incompatible with the hypothetical judgment, but it is not its contradictory. A genuine contradictory would be strong enough to rule out counterfactual conditionals.

b. Disjunctive Judgments

Bradley understands disjunction as providing a list of two or more mutually exclusive alternatives. He is willing to associate disjunction with a nest of hypothetical judgments, but since neither the hypothetical judgments nor the disjunction are truth-functional, the disjunctive judgment may have a certain categorical aspect. “Disjunctive judgment is the union of hypotheticals on a categoric basis.” (131)

Bradley connects disjunction with choice, where we make a selection from a number of alternatives. There is a definite list of possibilities; this is its categorical feature. We cannot use disjunctive addition to add in an arbitrary fashion another disjunct that is not a real possibility. In the same way, to say that something is colored is associated with a list of possibilities from which we select the actual color. To produce the disjunctive judgment that lists the varieties of color is to assign to the object categorically the property of being some kind of color, even if we do not know which color it is.

This example conforms to the template that Bradley favors in place of the form “either p or q or…” that is used today. Bradley treats the disjunctive judgment as a kind of singular judgment, with the format “A is either b or c or d….” This analysis will run into difficulties when A does not exist, but Bradley has met this problem before, and deals with it by replacing the grammatical subject with the real subject. This maneuver can even handle cases that seem most recalcitrant, such as “Either the light bulb is dead or the fuse has blown.” This would become: “Reality is either characterized by light bulb malfunction or fuse meltdown.”

9. Other Topics

a. Logical Principles

Chapter V examines logical principles. Bradley dismisses the Law of Identity as an empty tautology. Judgment requires the identity of differences, not provided by “A is A.” This means that the accusation (by Bertrand Russell) of confusing the “is” of predication with the “is” of identity cannot be fair, since for Bradley predication is the essence of judgment, whereas through the “is” of strict identity we do not make a judgment at all.

The most interesting part of the section on “The Principle of Contradiction” is the discussion of (Hegelian) dialectic. Bradley’s simple solution is that if the ideas combined in the synthesis are merely different, there is no problem. The ideas of self and other are different ideas, but no one would say that it is a contradiction to assert the existence of the self and other things as well. The challenge to the principle of contradiction comes, only if the different ideas combined are taken to be discrepant or contrary, since the contrary of a given proposition entails its contradictory. Bradley offers a compromise according to which ideas that appear to be contrary are reconciled when harmonized within a wider reality. For example, opposite properties can be assigned to the same thing at different times.

The Law of Excluded Middle takes the form of a disjunctive judgment and would be expressed today as “either p or not p.” Bradley, however, has a different form for disjunction, so that his version of the principle will be: “A is either b or not-b.” A is not always a real particular thing, but sometimes reality as such. Indeed, if Bradley gets his way, the ultimate subject will always be reality. Excluded middle uses the variety of disjunction in which the number of disjuncts is exactly two. When the second disjunct is constructed as the negation of the first, there can be no other choice.

b. Extension and Intension

Bradley next tackles the familiar distinction between intension and extension in the chapter on the quantity of judgment, explaining that “in every symbol we separate what it means from that which it stands for.” (168) (Frege’s distinction between sinn and bedeutung.) His account of the extensional treatment of universal judgments such as “Dogs are mammals” is disappointing, because he fails to register that a set is a special kind of entity, suggesting that a set of dogs must be a pack of dogs, failing which the only alternative is the ludicrous idea of a collection of dog-images in the mind! With a proper notion of set in place, “Dogs are mammals” can be taken to assert a relation between two sets, just as many other judgments assert a relation between two objects.

Judgments founded on intension refer to the connection of attributes and meanings, and ignore the denotation of objects. Universal judgments based on meanings are those Kant considers strictly universal, because they do not permit even the possibility of exceptions. Not all universal judgments are of this type, and singular judgments never are. Our concept of what is real, denoted in a singular judgment, is the concept of the individual, which is both particular, excluding all other individuals, and universal, as unifying various characteristics and constituting an identity in difference. The real individual is a concrete universal: abstract universals, which can be separated from the individual in thought and applied elsewhere, cannot be real. In a similar way, what is truly individual is a concrete particular; abstract particulars that are nothing more than their distinction from other particulars are also unreal. “A reality in space must have spatial diversity, internal to itself.” (188) A point in space is distinct from all other points, but is a mere abstraction. A moment in time is also an abstraction; a concrete individual existing in time must have some duration.

c. Modality

Bradley rejects as erroneous the view that modal differences do not affect the actual content of the judgments involved. Certainly, you can take any judgment and “express any attitude of your mind towards it.” (198) These propositional attitudes are many and various. I may say: “I wish to make it” or “I fear to make it” or “I am forced to make it.” “All these are simple assertorical statements about my condition of mind.” (198) Statements about possibility and necessity do not, however, express my state of mind. They are assertions that claim objective truth. “There clearly can be but one kind of judgment, the assertorical. Modality affects not the affirmation, but what is affirmed.” (197) This is in line with the logic of Principia Mathematica, in which everything takes place under the aegis of the assertion sign. In this system, there is not even a corresponding negation sign, just a sign for the negation of a proposition. This is more extreme than Bradley, who does allow a distinct function of negation.

Thus, judgments of necessity and possibility have a special content not to be found in the corresponding assertoric judgment. For Bradley, “The possible and the necessary are special forms of the hypothetical.” (198) Necessity consists in a necessary connection between antecedent and consequent in a hypothetical judgment. To say that a fact is necessary is not to elevate it to a higher status, but merely to say that it is a necessary consequence of some other state of affairs, also taken as fact. As already explained, the connection through which the antecedent necessitates the consequent must itself depend on a categorical ground. This includes cases where we assert a necessary connection, because of a regular succession of events. Not that this ground has to be a necessary causal connection. “The real connection which seems the counterpart of the logical sequence, is in itself not necessary.” (206)

Bradley also connects the possible with the hypothetical. To say that something is possible is to say that some of its conditions are satisfied, excluding those specified in the antecedent of the associated hypothetical statement. “It is possible to see an eclipse of the moon tonight” means “If you get up early enough and the weather co-operates, you will see an eclipse of the moon.” To assert a potentiality or power or disposition is to commit to a hypothetical judgment stating that if certain other conditions are satisfied, a certain state of affairs will necessarily come to pass.

Bradley has a problem with modality because of his metaphysical vision of a Parmenidean Absolute Reality. Modal distinctions come to life with the conception of an open future, in which some things are unavoidable and others are possibilities among which we may choose. What is actual at the present time cannot be properly said to be either possible or necessary (Bradley gets this right!); although some things that have taken place were necessary and others were not. Without this kind of background, the conceptual scheme Bradley is discussing would not exist.

10. Judgment: Concluding Remarks

In his presidential address to the American Philosophical Association in 1957 “Speaking of Objects,” W.V. Quine presents the manifesto for the position of modern logic. “We persist in breaking reality down somehow into a multiplicity of identifiable and discriminable objects to be referred to by singular and general terms. We talk so inveterately of objects that to say we do seems almost to say nothing at all; for how else is there to talk?” The reality to which Quine referred at the beginning disappears under the carpet and is heard from no more. For Bradley, the reality that is broken down is, and has to be, the reality available in immediate experience. It is broken down through the faculty of thought and judgment, which introduces distinct individuals characterized through universal logical ideas. This makes possible singular and plural judgments involving qualities and relations. Not all judgments about what is real conform, however, to this template. There are genuine judgments about reality that bypass a reference to real individuals. Some such judgments modern logic may handle in other ways, but there are some that remain troublesome, such as judgments involving mass terms. Bradley’s system of logic is more flexible and can handle the variety we find.

The strength of Bradley’s theory of judgment is the flexibility through which it accommodates a variety of forms. Its weakness is that through insisting that the ultimate subject of judgment is reality, he seems to undermine the legitimacy of the singular and plural judgments on which we normally rely. One way to retain Bradley’s logic while rejecting the absolute monism of his metaphysical theory is to recognize that “reality” is itself a mass term. The later developments in the logic of mass terms that are proving such a headache for modern logic also make more palatable the logic of Bradley. Concepts, like “gold”, which do not by themselves package reality into units in the same way as count nouns like “dog”, can be used in various ways. They can be used in a singular judgment to refer to a piece of gold: they can be used in plural judgments to refer to pieces of gold: and there is also a third use, as in “Gold is yellow,” where the concept is associated with a mass term. (Interestingly, Bradley uses this very example (46) without noticing its special character.) The possibility of this third use surely does not invalidate the other uses in singular and plural judgments.

This explanation of the process described by Quine is, of course, given at Bradley’s lower point of view, but the use of a mass term to designate the setting for the individual object, in place of a string of other individuals, may well discourage the desire to move to the mysterious higher view. To isolate within the sensuous felt mass, designated by a mass term, an individual object associated with an ideal content loosened from what is given, seems about as good an account of the process of thought as we can get.

11. The Nature of Inference

Bradley moves on in Books II and III to the important topic of inference. There is a problem emerging from the distinction between analytic and synthetic judgments of sense introduced in Book I, in that the synthetic judgments move us beyond what is given in immediate experience and must involve some kind of inference. In a book on the principles of logic, Bradley must also engage with the traditional doctrine of the syllogism, which was taken to be the core of deductive inference. Bradley proposes in the second book to deal with deductive inferences generally agreed to be valid, without probing too deeply, then moving in a third book to a fundamental theory intended to cover all forms of inference.

He begins by setting out three features of inference with which it is difficult to disagree. First, the conclusion of an inference depends on a process of thought through which it is reached. Second, the process rests on a basis. “In inference, we advance from truth possessed to a further truth.” (245) Third, there must be a difference between basis and conclusion; otherwise, the supposed inference is a “senseless iteration.” (246)

Bradley makes a list of forms of deductive inference, casting his net more widely to capture specimens that do not usually appear in the textbooks of the day. The traditional syllogism cannot be taken as fundamental, since it does not cover all the forms that Bradley has listed, such as those empowered by transitive relations. Bradley describes the process of inference as an operation of synthesis which “takes its data and by ideal construction combines them into a whole.” (256) Logical connection, however, requires the identity of common links, such as the middle term in a syllogism. The first step is to form the whole: the second step is to extract the conclusion perceived within the whole by omitting parts that are no longer of interest. Bradley denies that there is any general principle that will serve as a test of the validity of reasoning. The traditional syllogism is not up to the job and no replacement can be found.

The common link required to combine premisses is both the same and different. “If it were not different it would have nothing to connect, and if it were not the same there could be no connection.” (288) But how can we have both identity and difference? The solution is that the common term is an ideal content “appearing in and differenced by two several contexts.” (288)

The process of inference depends entirely on this identity in difference. There are, however, two radically different kinds of identity that Bradley does not distinguish at this point. There are universal characters which are identical throughout their various instantiations (abstract universals) and there are individual objects that remain identical throughout their various appearances (concrete universals). These individuals may even combine characters that are in some sense discrepant, if they are extended in space or enduring in time. Caesar was in Gaul, and Caesar was in Italy. Both types of identity in difference can provide a ground for inference, even within traditional syllogistic logic. By suggesting that inference takes place only through the development of an ideal content and not via reference to an individual object, Bradley undermines the singular judgment and prepares the ground for a logical doctrine that downgrades it.

12. The Association of Ideas

The “association of ideas” is the name for a process that exists as a psychological fact; what Bradley is attacking is the empiricist account of this fact and the use of it to explain judgment and inference. The empiricist theories of David Hume and John Stuart Mill attempt to explain the life of the mind in terms of the association of ideas that are distinct existences or psychological atoms. The laws of association usually recognized are contiguity and similarity. Bradley argues that the empiricists do not have the resources even to state clearly their central position, and offers the following restatement: “Any element tends to reproduce those elements with which it has formed one state of mind.” (304) He calls this law “redintegration”, getting the term from Sir William Hamilton. The use of the qualification “tends” is standard for laws of association. Bradley insists that his law “does not exclude any succession of events which comes as a whole before the mind,” (305) which is, of course, vital for the explanation of causal inference.

In spite of a superficial resemblance, there is a chasm that divides Bradley’s redintegration and the association of the empiricists. Association is cohesion between psychical particulars: redintegration concerns the connection of universals, “which is an ideal identity within the individuals.” (306) Only an ideal connection in the mind can survive the disappearance of connected individuals. The impressions originally given in conjunction are gone and cannot be resurrected. Only the universal ideal content, the “what” as opposed to the “that” is left behind as a memory trace. Through the universals, we may perhaps be able to produce images that are, as it were, ghosts of the past, but these images will be fresh particulars and distinct existences that can be considered re-incarnations of the past, only in virtue of an ideal identity preserved through the universal.

In the empiricist theory developed, for instance, by John Stuart Mill, the bare contiguity of impressions was not considered to be by itself sufficient to operate the mechanism of association. Past contiguity can be operative only if the memory thereof is introduced through the similarity between a component in a past experience and a sensation now being enjoyed. But we still face the problem: “What has been called up has never been contiguous; and what has been contiguous cannot be called up.” (318) Not even similarity can resurrect what is now dead and gone. Similarity can exist, only if the similar terms both exist. Therefore, reproduction through similarity is not possible, since the similarity requires that what is reproduced is already there.

There are few traces surviving today in either psychology or philosophy of the theory demolished by Bradley. The violence of the rhetoric, although amusing, might be considered excessive, but in its day the theory was solidly entrenched, and dynamite may have been justified.

13. Inductive Inference

It seems that we often make inferences from particulars to particulars. We take note that Fido barks when approached by a stranger; we infer that Rover will do the same. Bradley denies that such inferences tacitly involve the inductive generalization that all dogs bark when approached by strangers, since people quite happy to make the inference from Fido to Rover might be reluctant to issue a general guarantee for all inferences of this type. This does not mean, however, that universals are not involved. The inference to the barking of Rover is based on a connection of ideal content, acquired through the encounter with Fido.

Bradley now turns to inductive generalization through which we reach a conclusion about all members of a certain class when only some members have been examined. This arena is the stamping ground of John Stuart Mill against whom Bradley directs his fire. Even if Mill’s Methods may be useful, standard textbooks agree that they are not logically sound. Bradley endorses the usual criticisms, and adds the point that in any case they do not take us from mere particulars to general truths, since the facts from which they begin are already conceptualized as instances of general kinds.

14. Inference: The Inclusive Theory

The story so far is that inference operates by combining premises that contain a ground of identity. A conclusion is reached by eliminating the middle term. Bradley now recognizes that this theory will not cover all forms of reasoning and sees the need for a third book in which to put things right. The original theory will handle the syllogism and many other arguments. What it does not cover is arguments where there is no elimination of a middle term, where the conclusion emerges as a structure incorporating A, B, and C on the basis of information relating A to B and B to C. An example may clarify what Bradley has in mind. We connect a day to the day before through the identity of the intervening night and the same day to the day after through a similar process. In this way we construct a succession of days that will constitute a history. This result will count as the conclusion of an inference in the wide sense.

Mathematics is also important in our cognitive life, and often not covered by the theory in Book II. Other exceptions are the processes of comparison and distinction. These are mental operations resulting in judgment, and are therefore inferences. Recognition is also inference, when we make the move from the perception of the man entering the room to the recognition of someone seen before.

Hegelian Dialectic also transcends the pattern permitted in the original theory. Bradley offers a heretical version that tones down the excesses of the orthodox view. Instead of supposing that the process begins in contradiction, Bradley suggests that our unrest begins in the recognition that the original datum is incomplete. The dialectical move is to complete the incomplete through positing a larger whole in which it is a component. This larger whole is itself seen to be incomplete, and the process is repeated. The way in which the incomplete is completed has its source in the subject. Although a dialectical move may have a source in past experience, the inferential move goes directly from the datum to what lies beyond, even if we are able sometimes to uncover a hypothetical judgment expressing the function that controls the inference.

Bradley is now ready to unveil general characteristics of inference. Because it is intended to cover all cases, this will have to be vague. In the beginning is a datum or data, followed by a mental operation, producing a result. For example, in the inference: “A to the right of B, and B of C, and therefore A to the right of C” (432), we begin with “two sets of terms in relations of space” (432) and put them together. This act of construction makes a difference, “but it does not make such a difference to the terms that they lose their identity.” (432-3) Nor do A and C change their identity when directly related in the conclusion. Inference makes a change, but it does not change the world. Bradley often describes inference as “ideal experiment.” It is a movement of thought that we make, but we are not compelled to take this path. If we have several premises, we are not compelled to put them together. The act of combination is arbitrary, in the sense that it is something that we choose, but might not have chosen. The act of inference is not a revision of the original data, although it introduces a fresh thought.

This makes sense where there is more than one premiss and an act of combination is required that depends upon the will of the agent. But Bradley discovers many inferences where the conclusion issues through the development of a single premiss. Certainly, there is no inference without mental activity in which we begin with a datum and end with a judgment predicating a fresh characteristic; but does such intellectual activity all count as inference? Standard inference involves “a construction round an identical centre” (457), but there are non-standard inferences in which there seems to be no given identity. However, the middle process, the operation leading from datum to conclusion, cannot “dispense with all identity.” (457) The mere co-presence of all my thoughts is not enough, since this does not explain the special identity that enables the inference. Take “recognition” and “dialectic”, where we are given a real thing with a quality and infer another quality. The inference depends on the connection of these qualities, and we might want to say that the middle term is the given quality. The problem is that the connection of the qualities is neither explicit nor given. “It is a function of synthesis, which never appears except in its effects.” (458) “It is a construction by means of a hidden centre.” (458)Bradley distinguishes two operations associated with inference: synthesis and analysis. In synthesis the many become one; in analysis the one becomes many. Bradley makes a further distinction between analysis and elision. We may begin with a judgment about a given whole, move by analysis to a plural judgment about its elements, and then by elision reach a conclusion about specific elements. Central cases of inference in which premises are combined and a middle term eliminated involve both synthesis and analysis, but there are other inferences in which one or other operation is at least predominant.

Although they are different functions, analysis and synthesis have an intimate connection. In analysis, the elements in the result are separated, but this means that they are also combined in a latent synthetic unity. In synthesis, elements are combined, but the unity formed will be capable of analysis into the original components. “Analysis is the synthesis of the whole which it divides, and synthesis the analysis of the whole which it constructs.” (471) The crucial idea is the idea of the whole that analysis disassembles and synthesis constructs. In analysis we operate on an explicit whole that falls into the background. In synthesis we bring out the invisible totality comprehending the elements combined.

15. Inference and Judgment

With this wider conception of inference, it is getting harder to separate inference and judgment. Certainly, synthetic judgments of sense involve a substantial inferential component, but even a judgment that comes straight from presentation seems to involve the analysis and synthesis that is characteristic of inference. Judgment involves abstraction from the sensuous felt mass, and hence analysis. Judgments assigning various characters to reality involve synthesis. Bradley is certainly anxious to retain the distinction between judgment and inference. “Inference is an experiment performed on a datum,” whereas in judgments of perception “there is properly no datum.” (479) They do, indeed, have a basis, but this basis is for the intellect nothing. “It is a sensuous whole which is merely felt and is not idealized.” (479) Judgment is required to provide the ideal content from which inference takes its start. In judgments of perception we have no rational ground to justify our result and “the stuff, upon which the act is directed, is not intellectual.” (480) We can now, perhaps, make this clearer by explaining that the stuff in question is designated by a mass term.

The distinction between judgment and inference may not, however, be as sharp as one might like, as becomes clear when Bradley discusses the beginnings of our intellectual life. “The earliest judgment will imply an operation which, although it is not inference, is something like it; and the earliest reasoning will begin with a datum, which though kin to judgment, is not intellectual.” (481) “Experience starts with a stimulation coming in from the periphery [what John McDowell calls ‘a brute impact from the exterior’]; but….the stimulation must be met by a central response.” (481) Sensations do not “simply walk into the mind.” They are “the product of an active mental reaction.” (482) The senses may give us sensations, but “the gift contains traces of something like thought.” (482) The interface between cognition and the sensory input is murky indeed, but two things are clear. The response to the stimulus is not entirely arbitrary, nor is it a simple re-enactment of a given. Nothing is given until it is received!

16. Formal Logic

Bradley is hostile to the idea of a purely formal logic whose goal is to construct a system of valid patterns of inference, covering all cases through the use of blanks and variables. Partly, he does not believe that the goal can be achieved. More basically, his concern is that the attempt to reconstruct inference in terms of the manipulation of counters in accordance with rules breaks the connection between inference and that continued reference to reality that lies at its heart.

Inferences do, indeed, proceed in accordance with principles, and we can reject a principle employed by finding another similar inference in which the premiss is true and the conclusion false. In a particular inference, we can distinguish the principle from the matter involved, but we should not separate it and turn it into a major premiss in order to exhibit the argument as a syllogism. The principle is not a premiss, because it is not a datum but a function. There may sometimes be a point in replacing the original argument with such a syllogism, but this option will not always be available. Every inference depends on a principle that is not a premiss, as Lewis Carroll has shown in “What the Tortoise Said to Achilles.” Even Principia Mathematica has the Law of Substitution and the Law of Detachment that are not axioms of the system!

17. Truth and Validity

So far the focus has been on the phenomenology of inference. But inference is important, not because it takes place, but because it is taken to have validity and justification. The problem is to explain how inference can have validity and justification in the face of the fundamental dilemma that Bradley identifies. Unless there is a transition from the premiss to a different conclusion, nothing has happened, and there is no inference; but if there is a difference between premiss and conclusion, how can we justify the intellectual move? Bradley dismisses the extreme claim that since they are different, there is an actual contradiction between premiss and conclusion. To assert the premisses is not to deny the conclusion: it is merely to fail to assert it until the inference is completed. But how is the eventual assertion of a different conclusion to be justified?

Logicians who do not challenge the legitimacy of the analytic judgment of sense can form a concept of truth that will allow them to explain that what is crucial for a valid inference is not that there be no change from premiss to conclusion, but merely that there be no change in the truth value from true to false. In the case of valid deductive inference this is guaranteed, because we merely re-arrange our information to make a certain element more salient. What changes is merely our knowledge of the relation implicit in the premisses. The act of inference requires an intervention by the subject that is arbitrary in the sense that it might not have taken place; but in the case of valid deductive inference, it is not an intervention that tampers with the truth. There is, perhaps, more interference by the subject when a decision is made to eliminate part of the original ideal content, as when we drop the middle term in the conclusion of a syllogism. Dropping ideal content even makes it possible that the conclusion is true, when the premisses contain error; but this does not matter, so long as it remains the case that if the premisses are true, the conclusion must also be true.

Perhaps deductive inference can be handled, if we do not probe too deeply, but Bradley now comes to a “rising sea” of non-deductive inferences that are not so easily controlled. In mathematical construction we may infer the extension of a given straight line to double its size, but this is not the deduction of a conclusion from a premiss. Comparison and distinction are also acts of the mind that are not deductive inference. It could be argued, indeed, that these acts are not in fact inferences at all, but rather forms of plural judgment, originally involving more than one object distinguished within immediate experience. Bradley, however, would not be greatly interested in this, since in his final view the distinction between judgment and inference is to be broken down.

The really serious problem, however, is empirical inference, including the prediction of the future on which we rely so heavily to carry out our purposes. Bradley took the first step at the beginning of The Principles of Logic when he introduced the loosening from the given experience of an ideal content that can be transferred elsewhere. This may explain how it is possible to formulate a belief about what will happen, but it does not explain why we choose to adopt the beliefs we do, or how these beliefs are to be justified. Suppose we abstract from immediate experience a conjunction of ideal elements. This may tempt us to imagine a similar conjunction in our representation of the future, but this would be justified, only if the connection of the elements were unconditioned and necessary. Since in abstracting the conjunction from the given experience it has been separated from the context in which it was found, it remains, as Bradley believes, conditioned by that context. Since this context is never completely known, the successful transfer of an ideal complex abstracted from the given context to a fresh context that may well be different cannot be guaranteed.

The recognition of the context in which the given ideal content is embedded undermines its guaranteed transfer elsewhere. Does it also undermine the analytic judgment of sense that predicates the content of immediate experience? This is what we are led to think in the move to the higher point of view, and it would be extremely serious, since it would destroy the very concept of true judgment. It is ironic that at the beginning of The Principles of Logic Bradley uncovers the source of true judgment in the predication of an ideal content of an immediate experience from which it has been loosened and with which it is necessarily connected. This explains how it is possible to transfer an ideal content extracted from immediate experience to a segment of reality not immediately experienced. Such judgments, of course, may be either true or false.

This system is available as a lower point of view for those who are unable to follow Bradley all the way. (It is also there as a fallback position, in the event that a fatal flaw is discovered in Bradley’s advanced reasoning, although Bradley himself does not seem to fear this possibility.) The lower point of view is happy enough with the argument that empirical inferences have no logical guarantee, since the given object involved in the premiss is embedded in a context, ultimately unknown. This argument establishes a conclusion to which everyone would agree. What cannot be accepted is the use of the same fact to break the tie between ideal content and object that constitutes true judgment. Without a viable concept of true judgment, even inference as we normally understand it will disappear, since the premisses and conclusion of an inference are all judgments, and a deductive argument is valid, if the conclusion must be true when the premisses are all true.

18. The Final Doctrine

a. Inference

We have been following the argument in the first edition of The Principles of Logic, in which Bradley tries to keep out the influence of his own metaphysical ideas, when operating at the lower level. This is fortunate, because it makes Bradley’s often insightful discussion available to logicians who would be appalled by his metaphysics. Bradley, as we know, is not ultimately satisfied with the lower point of view and feels compelled to move to a different position, where the influence of his metaphysical views can be detected. This difficult theory was not well understood, so that in the second edition of The Principles of Logic he included a set of terminal essays, which he hoped would provide a clearer exposition of his final views.

The original book began with judgment; the terminal essays begin with inference which he now moves to the center. “Every inference is the ideal self-development of a given object taken as real.” (598) This definition attempts to explicate inference without using the notion of judgment, which will later be explained as a kind of inference. Even the third member of the logical trinity, the universal idea, is partly concealed under cover as “the given object.” The given object must be ideal, since this is the only kind of entity capable of ideal self-development. Bradley’s definition of inference would have been much clearer, if he had explained it as the ideal self-development of a logical idea taken as real. The concept of ideal self-development, however, contains a problem, encountered before. If there is no change, there is no inference; but if there is change, then “the inference is destroyed.”(599) Bradley cannot take the usual line that the transition in inference from judgment to judgment is valid, so long as the preservation of truth is guaranteed. This would be circular, since he intends to explain judgment in terms of inference. Bradley’s solution relies on the double nature of the datum, considered in itself and as part of a systematic whole. This is what is involved in the reference of the ideal content to reality. This reference to reality, familiar from Bradley’s initial account of judgment, now turns out to mean “taken to be real, as being in one with Reality, the real Universe.” (598) This is the point of “taken as real” in the original definition. To take an ideal content as real is to identify it with Reality, in so far as it belongs to Reality.

We can now perhaps understand why Bradley replaces “logical idea” with “given object” in his initial definition. A logical idea can only be a part of a system of logical ideas, a system of thought. A given object, as normally understood and as understood within Bradley’s lower point of view, is a part of the real universe. It is the act of judgment that connects the domain of thought with the real world. It is judgment that predicates a logical idea of reality or of an object that belongs to reality. Without judgment, the only possible movement of thought is a movement along a stream of ideas. The only thing more real than a logical idea is a complete system of all ideas, and we have fallen into the clutches of Hegel! To adopt the term “given object” to denote logical ideas makes it difficult to use the same term to introduce concrete individuals constituting the universe.

The movement of inference can be illustrated in the Dialectical Method, in which we expand a given content through recognition of its incompleteness. The explicit premiss is “some distinguished content set before us.” (601) Implicit is “the entire Reality as an ideal systematic Whole.” “Every member in this system…develops itself through a series of more and more inclusive totalities until it becomes and contains the entire system.” (601) When I use this method, everything is necessary except where I begin and when I stop. For Bradley, however, such inferences are never fully satisfactory, since their ground is largely implicit and unknown.

Bradley goes on to consider in some detail other processes such as analysis, abstraction and comparison. His discussion of arithmetic is of surprising interest, because the construction of the natural number series does seem to make sense of the notion of ideal self-development. Each natural number develops itself through the successor function to introduce the number that follows it. The number three is an ideal content, since it is a universal property shared by all triples, so that the transition to four must lie in the domain of ideality.

The representation of space and time is constituted through a similar process involving the ideal self-development of a given space or time. Although these examples may illuminate the obscure notion of ideal self-development, they will not help to explain inference, if the construction of the successor of a natural number or the space and time that lies beyond what is given is not an inference. Inference is usually considered a movement of thought from judgment to judgment, from premiss to conclusion. This is not what happens when we extend a line or form a new number.

b. Judgment

Bradley, however, would not accept this, since he considers judgment itself to be a kind of inference in the wide sense. It is a kind of inference in which the ground that compels the judgment is not made explicit. Inference is present, even in the purest case of an analytic judgment of sense. As we have seen, Bradley recasts the judgment “S is P” in the form: “Reality is such that S is P.” The word “such” is the placeholder for the ground in reality that compels the conclusion “S is P.” Since this condition is unspecified and not completely specifiable, the inferential structure is merely implicit. This is a radical change, under the influence of Bosanquet, from Bradley’s original position, where judgment lies at the interface between the ideal and the actual, between the universal and particular, and is hence distinct from inference which is a movement within thought.

Bradley supports his change of heart by giving an example. Suppose I immediately experience A to the right of B and therefore form the judgment that A is to the right of B. There is, presumably, some sort of causal explanation for the relative position of these things. My objection is that any such condition for the existence of a state of affairs is not a truth condition for the corresponding judgment. It would be a truth condition only if it were incorporated in the judgment, which it is not. Even if I am prepared to say that A is to the right of B because John put it there, I am not saying that A is to the right of B, if John put it there. My statement is categorical, not conditional, and I will insist that A is to the right of B, even if it turns out that John is not responsible.

The objects A and B that are the special subjects of the plural judgment are necessarily selected from and connected with “our whole Universe.” (Presumably, this is our Universe, because it is connected with our immediate experience.) In a singular judgment the special subject is this reality, which is “some special and emphasized feature in the total mass.” (629) All such special subjects are conditioned by what lies beyond. Even without invoking the law of causality, they are all conditioned by their setting in space and time. Bradley argues that since the special subject of the judgment must be conditioned, even if its conditions are not known, the judgment itself cannot be unconditioned. “The object therefore remains conditioned by that which is unknown, and only on and subject to this unknown condition is the judgment true.” (631) This sentence explicitly identifies the existence conditions of the object with the truth conditions of the judgment. If we refuse to make this jump, we can remain comfortably at Bradley’s “lower point of view” and ignore the obscure and baffling complexities of the esoteric theory.

c. The Fundamental Problem of Thought

Even if we insist on a sharper distinction between judgment and inference than Bradley would allow, there is a general idea of a movement of thought that covers both activities. There may be some movements of thought we prefer to call judgments and others we call inferences, but Bradley’s purpose is to dig out what all acts of thought have in common. He believes he can state the fundamental problem without a final distinction between judgment and inference. Thinking is a process that reaches a result, and this implies the transcending of some initial state. It is not enough, however, that there be a mere succession of states. The movement of thought requires justification. The movement of thought must “satisfy the intellect.” In the case of inference, the satisfactory is called “valid”; in the case of judgment, the satisfactory is called “true.” In both cases the problem of the satisfaction condition is essentially the same. “Thought demands to go proprio motu…with a ground and reason…. Now to pass from A to B, if the ground remains external, is for thought to pass with no ground at all.” (Appearance and Reality, Note A, 501) We might suppose that in the case of deductive inference, there is an internal ground within the domain of ideas, although Bradley would not agree. But there is clearly no such internal justification for the inferential move in the case of non-deductive or empirical inferences. The success of empirical inferences or predictions depends on the way the world is or will be. Our general level of success depends on our living in a reasonably well-ordered world in which we have developed reliable systems for the acquisition of information.

Since the ground that justifies the movement of thought is the nature of reality, this ground can never be brought within thought without the identity of thought and reality. Nothing less than this will satisfy the intellect. This is the essentially Hegelian move to identify thought and reality by turning reality into a system of thought. Not that a finite center can ever reach an unconditioned completion of its thought. We may try to get as close as we can, and the closer we get to a final completion, the more truth our thought contains. As we expand our system of thought to make it more comprehensive, the truer it will become, so long as it remains harmonious and coherent. Although the goal of Thought in Dialectic may be to complete the incomplete, Bradley believes that there is more to reality than even a completed system of thought could provide. Bradley is not a Hegelian, because he denies that the completion of thought, even if it were possible, would be identical with the Absolute. He rejects the replacement of reality by “some spectral woof of impalpable abstractions, or unearthly ballet of bloodless categories.” (591) Although Bradley follows Kant in accepting the transcendental ideality of the series of phenomena, a position that provided a stepping stone for Hegel, Bradley refuses to accept this creation of the mind as the reality encountered in immediate experience. For Bradley, “it is the whole continuity of the total series which is absolutely based on ideal reconstruction. By means of this function, and this function alone, we have connected the past in one line with the present.” (587)

d. Immediate Experience and the Absolute

Immediate experience is associated with a cluster of ideas: “this”, “my”, “now”, “here”. What is immediately experienced is felt. “Feeling may be either used of the whole mass felt at any one time, or it may again be applied to some element in that whole.” (659) What I immediately experience is real enough, but this does not mean that everything real must be experienced by me. As less than reality as a whole, Bradley calls my immediate experience an appearance of reality. To Bradley, “it seems clear that we not only start from the given ‘this,’ but remain resting on that foundation throughout. Our whole ordered universe we may call a construction resting on immediate experience.” (661)

Bradley clearly retains the phenomenal realism at the heart of traditional empiricism, while rejecting the idea that immediate experience is a collection of distinct existences, which was responsible for its demise. Experience, for Bradley, is originally a sensuous, felt mass. This is particularly acceptable with the re-instatement of mass terms, excluded by the logic of Principia Mathematica.

For Bradley, a collection of distinct existences is not given, but emerges through an analysis carried out by thought. “I have to turn my experience into a disjunctive totality of elements.” (665) This is uncannily like Quine’s idea that “we persist in breaking reality down somehow into a multiplicity of identifiable and discriminable objects.” The connection is particularly striking, once we realize that special subjects, as well as Reality as a Whole, may extend beyond what is presented in immediate experience. The ideal contents, necessary to separate objects within the sensuous felt mass, do not confine these objects to their presentation in immediate experience. Because the contents are universal, they permit what Hume would call the continued existence of such real things beyond their appearance in my mind.

Bradley’s theory must be taken very seriously because of the detailed account that it offers of a process that Quine leaves shrouded in mystery. It may be understood as a way of fixing what is wrong with empiricism. It is harder to sympathize with the arguments that led Bradley to abandon what he calls the “lower point of view” and which may be based on a mistake.

19. References and Further Reading

a. Selected works by F. H. Bradley

The Principles of Logic. Oxford University Press, 1883; second revised edition including terminal essays, 1922.
- (This is the main source for Bradley’s logical theory.)
Appearance and Reality. Oxford University Press, 1893; second edition with appendix, 1897.
- (The metaphysical theory.)
Essays on Truth and Reality. Oxford University Press, 1914.
- (A collection of articles, for the most part originally published in Mind, and many on broadly logical topics.)
Collected Works. Thoemmes Press: Bristol, England and Sterling, Va., 1999.
- (Volume I contains Bradley’s notes for The Principles of Logic.)

b. Further Reading

Allard, J. W., 2005, The Logical Foundations of Bradley’s Metaphysics: Judgment, Inference, and Truth. Cambridge University Press.
Basile, Pierfrancesco, 1999, Experience and Relations: an Examination of F. H. Bradley’s Conception of Reality. Chapter 4.
Blanshard, Brand, 1939, The Nature of Thought. Two Volumes. London: George Allen & Unwin.
- (Especially, Chapter XIII: Bradley on Ideas in Logic and in Psychology.)
Bosanquet, Bernard, 1885, Knowledge and Reality, A Criticism of Mr. F. H. Bradley’s ‘Principles of Logic’. London: Kegan Paul, Trench.
Bradley, James (ed.), 1996, Philosophy after F. H. Bradley. Bristol: Thoemmes.
Bradley Studies, the journal of the Bradley Society, was published from 1995 to 2004.
- (It has now been succeeded by Collingwood and British Idealist Studies.)
Campbell, C. A., 1931, Scepticism and Construction: Bradley’s Sceptical Principle as the Basis of Constructive Philosophy. London: George Allen & Unwin.
Campbell, C. A., 1957, On Selfhood and Godhood. London; George Allen & Unwin.
- (Gifford Lectures delivered at the University of St. Andrews.)
Campbell, C. A., 1967, In Defence of Free Will. London: George Allen & Unwin.
- (Chapter XII. The Mind‘s Involvement in Objects. This was originally published in 1962 as a contribution to Theories of the Mind, edited by Jordan M. Scher, published by the Free Press of Glencoe, a division of the Macmillan Company.)
Candlish, S., 2007, The Russell/Bradley Dispute and its Significance for Twentieth-Century Philosophy. Basingstoke: Palgrave Macmillan.
Ferreira, P., 1999, Bradley and the Structure of Knowledge. Albany: SUNY Press.
Ferreira P., 2014, ‘Idealist Logic’ in The Oxford Handbook of British Philosophy in the Nineteenth Century, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 111-132.
Hylton, Peter, 1990, Russell, Idealism, and the Emergence of Analytic Philosophy. Oxford University Press. Chapter 2.
Levine, James, 1998, “The What and the That: Theories of Singular Thought in Bradley, Russell and the Early Wittgenstein” in Appearance Versus Reality: New Essays on Bradley’s Metaphysics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Mander, W. J. (ed.), 1996, Perspectives on the Logic and Metaphysics of F. H. Bradley. Bristol: St. Augustine’s Press.
Mander, W.J., 2008, ‘Bradley’s Logic’ in D. Gabbay and J.H. Woods (eds.) Handbook of the History of Logic. Volume Four: British Logic in the Nineteenth Century, Elsevier, pp. 663-717.
Mander, W., 2011, British Idealism. A History. Oxford University Press.
Manser, A., 1983, Bradley’s Logic. Oxford University Press.
Peacocke, C., 1992. A Study of Concepts. Chapter 3. Cambridge MA and London: MIT Press.
- (This entry requires explanation, since Bradley is never mentioned in the book. Chapter 3 introduces scenarios, which are non-conceptual representational contents. As general, they qualify as ideal contents in Bradley’s sense. The positioning of scenarios in reality is therefore a special case of an act of judgment that refers an ideal content to a reality beyond the act. Peacocke is thus presenting the essence of Bradley’s position in an up-to-date form.)
Sprigge, T.L.S., 1993, James and Bradley. Chicago and La Salle, Illinois: Open Court. Part II. Chapters 2 and 3.
Wollheim, R., 1959, F. H. Bradley. Harmondsworth: Penguin Books.

Author Information

D. L. C. Maclachlan
Email: lorne.maclachlan@gmail.com
Queen’s University
Canada

Pierre Bayle (1647–1706)

Pierre Bayle was a seventeenth-century French skeptical philosopher and historian. He is best known for his encyclopedic work The Historical and Critical Dictionary (1697, 1^st edition; 1702, 2^nd edition), a work which was widely influential on eighteenth-century figures such as Voltaire and Thomas Jefferson. Bayle is traditionally described as a skeptic, though the nature and extent of his skepticism remains hotly debated. He is best known for his explicit defenses of religious faith against the attacks of reason, for his attacks on specious theological doctrines, and for his formulation of the doctrine of the erring conscience as a basis for religious toleration.

In contrast to his seventeenth-century contemporaries, Bayle is fundamentally an anti-systematic thinker. In keeping with his skepticism (understood in the ancient sense), he is committed to the thorough examination of arguments for and against the position under examination. This entails making the best arguments possible on both sides, as well as raising the strongest possible objections to both sides. As a result, in many cases, it is difficult to determine just what Bayle’s position is. Commentators refer to this phenomenon as the “Bayle enigma,” and it affects virtually every area of Bayle’s thought, undermining the legitimacy of his defenses of religious faith and calling into question the sincerity of his attacks on theology.

Bayle’s influence extends beyond philosophers; his texts have occasioned interest from historians, theologians, literary scholars, and political theorists. Bayle was incredibly prolific, both in personal correspondence and in published work. The encyclopedic format of his Dictionary showcased the dazzling breadth and depth of his knowledge, a learning which was also on display during his years as the editor of the intellectual journal News from the Republic of Letters (1684-1687). Bayle produced most of the content of the journal—primarily book reviews—during his editorship. His authorship of anonymous works has also been established, most recently in the case of the Important Advice to Refugees (1690). The enormous variety of topics that Bayle treated over the course of his lifetime, the diversity of formats that he used to do so, and the indeterminate nature of his arguments make him a rich topic for scholarly investigation.

Biography and Intellectual Context
Anti-Systematicity
Skepticism
1. What Kind of Skeptic was Bayle?
  1. The “Surreptitious Atheist” Reading
  2. The “Christian Fideist” Reading
2. Moral Knowledge
The Problem of Evil
The Erring Conscience and Religious Tolerance
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography and Intellectual Context

Bayle was raised as a French Calvinist, or Huguenot, from his birth in 1647 in Le Carla, a small village in the south of France, until he left for the Jesuit college in Toulouse. His father, a Huguenot pastor, and his family were astonished by his 1669 conversion to Catholicism, presumably as a result of his studies under the Jesuits at Toulouse. Bayle reconverted to Calvinism eighteen months later, however, officially becoming a rélaps, the most persecuted religious classification under the French Catholic monarchy. Predictably, Bayle then fled France, and studied at a Calvinist seminary in Geneva for two years under Louis Tronchin. After Bayle figured out that the pastoral vocation was not for him, he transferred to the University of Geneva to study Cartesian philosophy. After completing his studies there and returning to France in disguise as “Bâle” in 1674, Bayle spent a year as a tutor in Rouen and Paris before securing a position in 1675 at the Protestant Academy of Sedan.

It was at Sedan that Bayle first came into contact with Pierre Jurieu, a Calvinist theologian who became Bayle’s mentor, but over time, his most bitter enemy. Bayle and Jurieu initially were so close that when the French government closed the Sedan academy in 1681, Bayle followed Jurieu to the Ecole Illustre, an academy in Rotterdam for Huguenot refugees where they both joined the faculty. Their mutual animus likely had its genesis in Bayle’s refusal of a marriage arranged by the Jurieu family, but there were also intellectual reasons for the cooling of Bayle and Jurieu’s relationship. The publication of Bayle’s Philosophical Commentary (1686-88), which advocated religious toleration, had already raised Jurieu’s suspicion of Bayle. The animosity increased markedly in 1690, when Bayle’s anonymously-published Important Advice to Refugees occasioned heated attacks by Jurieu, who saw the work as profoundly anti-Protestant.

During his initial years in Rotterdam, almost all of Bayle’s writings had been focused on attacking Catholic theology and practice, including General Critique of Maimbourg’s History of Calvinism (1682), Diverse Thoughts on the Occasion of a Comet (1683), and An Entirely Catholic France (1686). The death of Bayle’s father and brothers in 1684 and 1685, and the Revocation of the Edict of Nantes in 1685, provided strong personal reasons for Bayle to attack Catholic intolerance. Jurieu saw the Advice to Refugees, however, as evidence that Bayle had turned against his Huguenot roots, and denounced Bayle as a heretic. Jurieu’s public proclamations against Bayle, however, were inconsistent with Bayle’s fidelity to the Reformed community in Rotterdam, and evidence from Bayle’s deathbed seems to support his adherence to the Calvinist religion for the rest of his life.

The text that solidified Bayle’s reputation as a grave danger to religious belief, however, was his Dictionary, the encyclopedic work that was Bayle’s magnum opus. The Dictionary contains many articles that implicitly criticize his Protestant contemporaries, including Jurieu, as well as articles that seem to undermine the rationality of religious belief as a whole. Bayle clarified his criticisms in the second edition of the Dictionary in 1702, which included “Eclaircissements”, or Clarifications, on several of the most controversial articles. These explanations did not deflect criticism, however, and Bayle provided even more fodder for his critics with the publication of his Response to the Questions of a Provincial (1704) and Continuation of Diverse Thoughts (1705). These late works contain reconstructions of coherent atheist positions, and support Bayle’s earlier position from Diverse Thoughts that atheists could be morally upright. Bayle continued to respond to his critics until the day of his death on December 28, 1706. That day, he wrote in a letter to a friend, “I am dying as a Christian philosopher, convinced of and pierced by the bounties and mercy of God.”

Despite this final piece of evidence toward Bayle’s religious fidelity, many Enlightenment philosophes in the generations following Bayle saw him as their intellectual ancestor. One of Bayle’s most famous admirers was Voltaire, who is probably most responsible for Bayle’s reputation as the “arsenal of the Enlightenment,” a reference to the many arguments that the philosophes found in Bayle. The philosophes adapted these arguments to attack religious and superstitious beliefs among philosophers and theologians, using the arguments to show the absurdity of any supernatural belief whatsoever. The Enlightenment portrait of Bayle has defined his place in intellectual history, until the more recent interpretations of the twentieth century.

2. Anti-Systematicity

In the history of the early modern philosophy, Bayle is one of the most controversial, and least understood, intellectuals of the period. Unlike other canonical seventeenth-century figures, Bayle gave no explicit systematization of his philosophical positions. While Bayle wrote on philosophical and theological problems ranging from toleration to the problem of evil, he produced no definitive or complete exposition of his ideas. Despite the widespread popularity of his Dictionary, Bayle is typically not considered to be a canonical philosopher. This is perhaps because the philosophical insights in Bayle’s work are buried in theological polemic, obscure reference material, and extremely prolix arguments. Relatively few scholars have taken on the difficult task of mining these insights until recently.

The Dictionary, one of the most problematic texts of the early modern period, is the obvious place to begin any interpretation of Bayle’s thought. Bayle’s stated purpose in writing the Dictionary was to update and correct the work of Louis Moréri’s Grand Historical Dictionary (1674). Bayle thought that Moréri’s dictionary was hopelessly out of date and inaccurate, and Bayle hoped that his work would replace Moréri’s as a standard reference work. The Dictionary, however, is neither objective nor exhaustive, at least by today’s standards. The majority of the Dictionary’s pages are not even devoted to the scholarly articles themselves, but rather to remarks and footnotes that Bayle uses to articulate his own thoughts on the topics of the articles – or even on other topics that are only tangentially related to the topic of the article. Furthermore, Bayle routinely makes mutually inconsistent claims throughout the Dictionary.

It is not just the underdetermined, dense, and paradoxical, nature of the Dictionary that poses an interpretive problem for scholars of Bayle; the problem is magnified when one examines Bayle’s corpus as a whole. The breadth and complexity of his work is dizzying; Bayle’s writing ranges over a wide variety of topics and genres, from superstition to Biblical exegesis to astronomy to metaphysics, and from historical critiques to literary reviews to journal articles to theological treatises. Elisabeth Labrousse, an internationally regarded scholar of Bayle, notes that “[a]t turns, Bayle speaks the language of a Calvinist theologian, a Huguenot pamphleteer, a disciple of Malebranche, or a spiritual child of Erasmus, Montaigne, and Naudé.” Furthermore, Bayle’s scholarship on all of these topics and in all of these genres was exhaustingly thorough. His scholarly training at Toulouse taught him to examine not just his own position on a particular issue, but also to examine all possible objections and replies to his position, in as much detail as necessary to demolish his opponent. His arguments cite both the relevant historical and contemporary sources, a testament both to his encyclopedic mind and to his lifelong obsession with the intellectual trends of his day. Bayle’s arguments are so intricate that it is often unclear exactly what positions the arguments are supposed to be defending. As Jean Delvolvé, an early twentieth-century scholar of Bayle, aptly notes,

The very originality of Bayle’s ideas, their lack of systematic construction, their diffusion in the mass of a work that is prolix to excess, their intentionally obscured and enveloped exposition – for they must be discovered through a thousand réticences, and among the trompe-l’oeil of affirmations to the contrary – all these reasons hindered the comprehension of Bayle by his contemporaries and have hindered him taking his rightful place in the history of human thought.

The paradoxes of Bayle’s work have given rise to a number of different readings of Bayle. First, the complexity and seeming ambiguity of Bayle’s arguments have been cited as evidence that Bayle ought to be read primarily as an ironic critic. According to this reading of Bayle, all of his arguments that ostensibly defend traditionalist positions are really just vehicles for proto-Enlightenment critiques of those same positions. The completeness of Bayle’s arguments, and his dedication to charitable reconstruction of his opponent’s arguments, is not evidence of Bayle’s responsible scholarship, but is rather a chance for him to advance his own subversive views. That these views are in fact Bayle’s is supported by the paradoxical replies and weak counterarguments that he offers in response to the charges of his opponents. According to this, Bayle’s apparent acceptance of what seem to be obviously anti-intellectual paradoxes by an otherwise philosophically sophisticated mind provides support for reading Bayle as a kind of subversive anti-traditionalist.

An alternative reading of Bayle is as a kind of complicated traditionalist. The complex structure of Bayle’s arguments reflects not subversive critique, or even rational agnosticism, according to this reading. Instead, it reflects Bayle’s desire to demonstrate for his opponents, via a reductio ad absurdum, the paradoxes of reason with respect to metaphysics in general, and with respect to philosophical theology in particular. This reductio of reason provides an explanation both of Bayle’s use of rigorous philosophical argumentation, and of his explicit affirmation of apparent paradoxes. This reading of Bayle as a philosopher who uses reason to disarm itself is consistent not only with his commitment to responsible argument, but also with the evidence of his lifelong adherence to traditional Huguenotism.

Recent readings of Bayle have resisted even attempts to make him into either an ironic critic or a complicated traditionalist. This anti-systematic reading of Bayle recognizes the multiple ambiguities and difficulties inherent in any attempt to provide a systematic interpretation of Bayle. According to this reading, the nature of Bayle’s texts prohibits fixing any sort of singular interpretation to his thought. What is most distinctive about Bayle’s thought is not its irony or traditionalism, but rather its dialogic character and polyphonic thinking. Bayle’s texts consistently allow multiple voices to speak autonomously, rather than as vehicles for his own views; it is thus a grave interpretive error, on this reading, to impose an artificial systematization on a text to create a single voice or interpretation. In other words, the typical temptation to force internal consistency onto Bayle’s texts – even a skeptical consistency – would not just be a hermeneutic mistake; it would be a philosophical one, because it would require the pursuit of consistency between arguments defending opposing positions.

3. Skepticism

a. What Kind of Skeptic was Bayle?

Reading Bayle as a skeptic of one kind or another has a long history, going back to his own contemporaries and continuing through present-day commentators. The sense in which Bayle is a skeptic is not entirely straightforward, but what is clear is that Bayle exhibits a profound suspicion of reason’s ability to deliver certain knowledge. In Bayle’s view, reason seems to be useful in enabling us to draw conclusions about the world, but it runs into so many contradictions and yields so many paradoxes that it ultimately undermines itself, and thus cannot be trusted. Thus, Bayle’s skepticism is, minimally, skepticism about the reliability of reason. Aside from this point, however, interpreters of Bayle diverge about the nature and extent of Bayle’s skepticism. How best to understand Bayle’s skepticism is often a function of the more general reading that one takes of Bayle’s overall projects and positions.

i. The “Surreptitious Atheist” Reading

Taking its cues from the “ironic critic” reading of Bayle, this interpretation of Bayle’s skepticism sees it as fundamentally a kind of Stratonianism, a position that Bayle outlines in the Continuation of Diverse Thoughts (1705). Strato, the position’s namesake, was the third leader of the ancient Lyceum, after Aristotle and Theophrastus. Unlike other ancient philosophers, Strato is uncompromising in his atheism. Bayle himself is interested less in the position advocated by Strato himself than in a modern adaptation of Stratonianism. This is because Strato represents for Bayle the position of seventeenth-century libertins: the denial of a providential God, and the affirmation of the eternity and infinity of the universe.

The case that Stratonianism represents Bayle’s own philosophical position is not found in Bayle’s arguments themselves, but rather in a methodological feature of their structure. Bayle typically structures his arguments not to support directly the position he actually holds; rather, he constructs the best possible argument for the strongest opposing position, and then defeats it later. This eventual defeat makes evident the superiority of the position Bayle actually holds. Bayle explicitly develops the position of the Stratonian atheist over the course of the Continuation, and, according to this reading, this position is never refuted by Bayle. Thus, the strongest opposing position to natural philosophical theology is left standing as a menace to theist philosophers. Reading Bayle in this way assumes that if Bayle’s position were not that of the Stratonian atheist, then he would have provided more decisive objections; in the absence of those objections, Bayle is implying that Stratonianism is the only philosophically defensible position.

ii. The “Christian Fideist” Reading

Taking its cues from the “complicated traditionalist” reading of Bayle, this interpretation of Bayle’s skepticism sees it as a kind of fideism. Bayle’s (heterodox) Calvinism, and the context of Cartesianism and Protestant theology more generally, is taken as fundamental to his thought. According to this reading, the complex structure of Bayle’s arguments reflects not an implicit atheism, but rather his desire to demonstrate the paradoxes of reason with respect to metaphysics, and with respect to the metaphysical claims of religion in particular. This demonstration of the paradoxes of reason provides a basis both for Bayle’s affirmation of Calvinist theology, and for his use of rigorous philosophical argumentation. This reading is thus consistent not only with his commitment to responsible argument, but also with his apparent lifelong adherence to the Calvinist faith.

Textual evidence for this reading is Bayle’s furious reply to the Jesuit father Maimbourg’s History of Calvinism (1682). Bayle wrote his reply – General Critique – in two weeks, and in it, Bayle makes clear both his Protestant convictions and his commitment to them. Bayle emphasizes that since the workings of Providence are infinite, they could not be comprehended by finite reason. However, French Calvinism contains strong elements of Cartesianism, and Bayle himself asserts in Diverse Thoughts that his views were not far from those of Malebranche.

Ultimately, though, this reading holds that Bayle’s pessimistic assessment of reason is what characterizes the bulk of his work. Throughout Bayle’s journal News from the Republic of Letters, he makes critical remarks about the arguments of secular rationalists, and these remarks indicate that all rational investigation of theological or philosophical questions results in puzzles that reason is powerless either to affirm or deny. Bayle also remarks in his Dictionary that “there is no contradiction between these two things: (1) the light of reason teaches me that that is false; (2) Moreover, I believe it because I am persuaded that this light is not infallible and because I prefer to defer to the proofs of sentiment and to the impressions of conscience, in a word, to the word of God, than to defer to a metaphysical demonstration” (“Spinoza,” Rem. M). This is evidence not only of Bayle’s sincerity in his faith, but also of his confidence in the coherence of his religious and philosophical views.

b. Moral Knowledge

Bayle’s account of moral knowledge rests on a function of reason that he calls la droite raison, or right reason. Despite his skepticism, Bayle seems to hold that what he calls the “common notions” of morality are well-grounded insofar as they come from right reason.

The most famous example of a “common notion” delivered by right reason is found in Bayle’s Philosophical Commentary, where he argues that the interpretation of Scripture must be limited by the “clear and distinct notions of the natural light… with respect to morality” (I.i). This conclusion initially appears to be quite heterodox; if read in its most radical form, it seems to imply that any Christian doctrine that is refuted by reason (“the natural light”) is false. What Bayle actually asserts here, however, is not the falsity of any Christian doctrine that is against reason; rather, he asserts only the falsity of particular dogmas that are purported to be in Scripture. For Bayle, the “natural light” reveals the immorality of the forced conversions for which Catholics purported to find justification in Scripture, and their immorality invalidates their purported justification. This highlights the most important consequence of the passage: that the natural light trumps the claims of dogma with respect to morality. Bayle’s skepticism entails that the natural light is fallible, and can be self-contradictory in some domains. It appears, however, that the natural light is reliable with respect to moral truths – at least, with respect to those that apply to humans.

Bayle reiterates the reliability of the natural light with respect to moral truths consistently throughout the Philosophical Commentary, which is unsurprising since the text is a defense of the morality of religious toleration. This position, however, appears in other texts as well. In Diverse Thoughts, wherein Bayle argues that atheists can be moral, he notes that certain moral principles are not only rational, but that moral praise and blame can be rationally assigned to those who live accordingly.

Bayle argues that the atheist has access to right reason, which confirms basic moral truths. Bayle also provides examples of the specific basic moral truths in question: “it is rational to respect one’s father, to hold to one’s word, to console the afflicted, to help the poor, to have gratitude for one’s benefactors, etc.” (OD III 406a). There is no hint of any of the skeptical doubts that Bayle characteristically raises; this suggests that he is using a non-skeptical notion of reason when discussing basic moral beliefs.

One of the final texts of Bayle’s life, Response to the Questions of a Provincial (1704-1707), also offers evidence of Bayle’s insistence on the rational accessibility of moral truths. Bayle’s position there is that atheists can be moral because they can know the conformity of virtue with right reason. He concedes that if this were not true – that is, if morality were only clearly conceivable through revelation – then atheists could not be moral. According to Bayle, however, right reason is as universal as the principles of logic. Bayle’s point in RQP is not to highlight the universality of the principles of logic, but simply to note that if one acknowledges the authority of principles of logic, then the sort of reason at issue here – right reason – should enjoy the same privileges. Other passages in RQP call into question the universality of right reason, particularly in rendering moral judgments about the conduct of God, but not with respect to human conduct.

Bayle’s Abridged System of Philosophy (1675-1680), which are lecture notes from his first position as a professor at Sedan, are where he provides his most systematic treatment of the notion of right reason. In the section of notes on moral theory, Bayle defines right reason as “the judgment that the soul naturally renders on practical conclusions, or conclusions regarding morality that are drawn from practical principles” (OD IV 261b). Bayle thus restricts the scope of right reason to moral, or practical, principles. Unlike the merely plausible conclusions of a skeptical conception of reason, Bayle argues that the natural light of reason – which Bayle uses interchangeably with right reason, when the natural light is illuminating practical matters – suffices to know moral truth. The principles of morality that are known by right reason are universally and evidently true. Bayle argues, further, that right reason is also the standard by which the goodness of particular actions are judged (OD IV 261b).

There is a significant complication in Bayle’s account of moral knowledge, however; in the midst of a discussion on right reason, he introduces the notion of conscience. Bayle defines conscience as

a practical judgment of the understanding, which dictates to us that we must do or ought to have done something, as being praiseworthy, and that we must avoid or ought to have avoided something, as being shameful. In a word, it’s an understanding of the natural law by which each person judges which thing is praiseworthy & ought to be done, and which other thing is shameful & ought to be avoided (OD IV 261b).

This sounds very similar to Bayle’s description of the guidance offered by right reason.

Further, Bayle’s account of moral knowledge is complicated even more by his use of illumination language to describe the conscience: he claims that the “natural light” leads us to affirm the principles of morality. He initially refers to natural morality itself as a “certain light in the soul” that obliges the recognition of general principles of morality. He also, however, makes reference to the light by which we affirm the principles of morality, and which supposedly lead us to natural morality. There seems to be a distinction, then, between “natural morality” (“the first general principles of morality”), which is a certain light, and the “natural light” of conscience – non-identical to the “natural light” of reason – for which the standard is not praiseworthiness, but rather fairness. Further, those led by conscience are merely supposed to have natural morality.

There is a clear connection for Bayle, then, between right reason as the faculty that grounds moral knowledge, and our rational nature – or at least the leftovers of our prelapsarian rational nature. Unfortunately, it also opens the possibility that the obligation of one’s conscience could attach to moral beliefs that were erroneous, or that were in some way contrary to the dictates of right reason, if the conscience were not being guided by right reason. Right reason is a crucial check on the moral “knowledge” provided by conscience in the following ways. First, the conscience can be affected by prejudices and errors, and unless it is rid of those, it cannot function as a moral guide. Relatedly, as a result of its susceptibility to prejudice and error, a conscience can be falsely persuaded of the licitness or illicitness of a particular action. Finally, one whose conscience is falsely persuaded can still commit acts that are in conformity with right reason, even though her erring conscience says that such acts are illicit. Similarly, a person who commits a wrongful act deemed by his erring conscience to be licit is still acting against right reason, despite the conformity with conscience. Thus, while conscience delivers verdicts on the morality of particular actions by particular individuals, right reason is the ultimate arbiter of morality in general. This provides a significant external check on the potentially erring conscience.

4. The Problem of Evil

Bayle’s treatment of the problem of evil is well-known, and occasioned Leibniz’s writing of the Theodicy (1710). Bayle’s Dictionary articles on the Paulicians, the Manicheans, and the Marcionites, as well as his subsequent clarification on the “Paulicians” and “Manicheans” articles, are where Bayle develops the position to which Leibniz is responding. Bayle also treats the issue in Response to the Questions of a Provincial and Dialogues of Maximus and Themistius (1707), where he critiques rationalist responses to the problem of evil. Bayle is pessimistic regarding the use of reason to make sense of evil: he holds that a priori reasons fail to address the a posteriori reality of evil. In other words, any attempt to explain the existence of evil rationally is contradicted by lived experience. Bayle supports this position by showcasing the strengths and weaknesses of both the orthodox and the Manichean solutions to the problem of evil, and concludes that both positions fail. What’s more, the failure of these solutions is not merely beyond the ken of human reason; the proposed solutions are comprehensible to reason, but simply fail its evaluation.

Bayle’s first extensive treatment of the problem of evil is in the Dictionary. In particular, the articles on the Manicheans and the Paulicians provoked a strong response from his fellow Huguenot refugees in Holland, prompting him to write a clarification of his position in those two articles for the second edition of the Dictionary. In Remark D of “Manicheans,” Bayle considers two different responses to the problem of evil, using the personage of Zoroaster on the one hand, and Melissus of Samos on the other. Bayle frames their positions in terms of a priori and a posteriori reasons. According to Bayle, the rational notions of order are what naturally lead us to think that an eternal, self-existent, and necessary being must also possess omnipotence and omnibenevolence. According to Bayle, this is an instance of an a priori reason: the ideas therein are clear and distinct, and it is internally coherent. With respect to the problem of evil, however, a priori reasons are merely the beginning of the discussion; this is because evil is a phenomenon – it is experienced. This entails that, according to Bayle, a posteriori reasons are also relevant; whatever conclusion that is supported by a priori reasons – that of a single unifying principle – may or may not be the same conclusion supported by a posteriori reasons.

Bayle imagines a debate between Melissus and Zoroaster in which they examine the pros and the cons of both the proposed solutions to the problem of evil, with Melissus defending the single unifying principle, and Zoroaster defending the existence of two principles, one evil and one good. Melissus holds that a priori reasons favor the existence of a single unifying principle, and Zoroaster agrees that Melissus surpasses him “in the beauty of ideas and in a priori reasons” (305b). Zoroaster challenges Melissus, however, to explain the source of the evil caused by humankind, and argues that the existence of two principles better explains this phenomenon; it provides better a posteriori reasons than a single unifying principle. Even when Melissus argues that physical evil is simply a response of God’s justice to moral evil, Zoroaster replies that humankind’s inclination to evil is a defect that could not be caused by a single unifying principle with every perfection. Melissus’ final attempt to blame humankind for evil fails, according to Zoroaster, because even the freedom that Melissus claims for humankind is not truly free, since it exists completely by the action of God. Zoroaster argues that it is inconsistent with a priori reasons that a single, omnibenevolent principle would not only fail to prevent moral evil, but would then punish humankind with physical evil for the moral evil that they commit – but for which the single principle is still ultimately responsible.

There is a rational intractability, then, in Bayle’s conception of the problem of evil: a priori reasons contradict a posteriori evidence, and yet the solution that best accounts for the a posteriori evidence – the “two principles” solution – is inconsistent with a priori reasons – particularly with the notion that a single omnibenevolent principle could in any way be the origin of evil. The intractability of the problem forces Bayle to propose an entirely different strategy: the only way out of the rational dilemma of evil is to look beyond the contradictions of reason to the realm of facts. (By “facts,” Bayle means something like “that which is found in Scripture”.) In the case of the problem of evil, the relevant “fact” is the evidence of Scripture that an omnibenevolent, holy, and omnipotent God has either allowed or caused evil to exist. Further, as revelation, Scripture is not merely additional a posteriori evidence; it has the added epistemological weight of faith. The actuality of this state of affairs – the coexistence of this kind of God with evil – is enough to counter the objection of impossibility, according to the principle of logic: “From the actual to the possible is a valid inference.” This factual strategy for addressing the problem of evil is consistent throughout the rest of the Dictionary, and is consistent with Bayle’s continual insistence in the Dictionary on the supremacy of revelation (“faith”) in the face of rational challenges.

Though the Dictionary is the most famous place where Bayle engages the problem of evil, his last two works, Response to the Questions of a Provincial and Dialogues of Maximus and Themistius, contain an extensive treatment of related issues as well. Bayle’s targets are many in these works, but one of the central ones is Isaac Jacquelot, a Reformed theologian who defends a theodicy-type position. Jacquelot was one of the Huguenot rationaux, a group of intellectuals defined by Calvinist theological commitments and broadly Cartesian philosophical ones. Jacquelot was deeply engaged in the project of rational theology, and had a fruitful intellectual history with Bayle. Jacquelot was profoundly influenced by Malebranche, particularly in the divine omniscient governance of nature, and the sinful effects of free will. The common interests of Malebranchean philosophy and Huguenot theology make Jacquelot an excellent interlocutor for Bayle. Bayle’s proposed explanation of the problem of evil remains essentially unchanged from his position in the Dictionary: that ultimately, it is futile to argue a priori reasons against the fact of the coexistence of God’s nature with evil.

Bayle’s proposed solution to the problem of evil reappears in Response to the Questions of a Provincial as part of a debate about free will. Since a hallmark of Reformed theology is the total sovereignty of God over creation, it is difficult for any reformer to hold that the freedom granted to humankind can clear God of responsibility for the evil acts of his creatures. If God is truly sovereign, then he would have some kind of governance over the choices of humans – minimally, he would have foreknowledge of the choices causally connected to the existence of evil, and thus foreknowledge coupled with omnipotence seems to entail a responsibility for God to act such that evil does not come into existence. If this is true, then God is in fact responsible for the existence of evil just insofar as he has not prevented it. Bayle never denies any part of this argument; he seems unwilling to look over or explain away its various premises in the way that his predecessors and contemporaries do.

Bayle’s original proposal for addressing the coexistence of God and evil, however, is consistent with this line of argumentation. As in the Dictionary, Bayle advocates in RQP a “factual” approach to the intractability between God’s omnibenevolence and evil: Scripture declares that this coexistence is so, and it is nonsensical for reason to argue against a matter of fact. Bayle also explicitly refuses the proposal by Jacquelot that the incompatibility is simply above reason by rejecting the “above reason/against reason” distinction. According to Bayle, there is no such thing as “above reason” when the reason at issue is human reason: either an axiom is compatible with human reason, or it is against human reason. If something appears not to conform to human reason, then by definition, Bayle argues, it also appears contrary to it.

One objection to this reading of Bayle is that in fact, there is not much difference between Bayle’s position and the “above reason” position –the two positions in fact represent a distinction without a difference. If Bayle ultimately endorses belief in the coexistence of God and evil in the face of apparent contradiction, the objection goes, he is at least implicitly endorsing some truth that is beyond human reason. The point of true disagreement, however, is that according to the “above reason” position, what is above human reason is still consistent with human reason, though incomprehensible to it. When one considers the divine mysteries, however, it is obvious that, to the extent that they are comprehensible by human reason, they run contrary to it. The doctrine of the Trinity runs contrary to the laws of mathematics; the doctrine of the Incarnation runs contrary to our conception of an object’s ability to have more than one nature; and the doctrine of Jesus’ bodily resurrection runs contrary to our conception of the nature of physical bodies. These conflicts are within the realm of human reason, not above it, and though the mysteries are not fully explicable – thus “mysteries” – they are comprehensible enough to make the conflict a real one, not merely apparent.

In the Dialogues of Maximus and Themistius, Bayle is careful to restrict his rejection of the “above reason/against reason” distinction to the scope of human reason. This is because the problem of evil is so repugnant to human reason that the only possible response to it must completely throw out the conclusions of human reason. Bayle challenges Jacquelot to explain how God’s allowing evil could ever be adequately explained using human reason. According to human reason, Bayle argues, God’s allowing evil to exist violates a priori reasons and our idea of God as omnibenevolent. The position here is essentially that of the Dictionary, and Bayle’s reiteration of it in the Dialogues seems to show that he is unimpressed with Jacquelot’s proposed solution to the problem of evil.

According to Bayle, the specific problem with Jacquelot’s proposed solution to the problem of evil is that Jacquelot accepts divine foreknowledge. Presumably, Jacquelot’s retention of divine foreknowledge is supposed to support the possibility of a free will defense. Bayle notes, however, that divine foreknowledge is actually not all that helpful: even with divine foreknowledge, the existence of evil calls into question God’s omnibenevolence, since a being who foresees the negative consequences of free will cannot have good intentions if he persists in bestowing it on humans.

These objections support Bayle’s assertion in the Dialogues that his solution to the problem of evil is really the last left standing: believing, in spite of lacking an understanding of how God’s omnibenevolence is compatible with evil. Importantly, for Bayle, this belief is not grounded in the faculty of reason, but rather on the declaration of Scripture that God and evil in fact coexist. Bayle’s later works trend toward a kind of moral rationalism with respect to human conduct, but his advocacy of this factual solution to the problem of evil never changes throughout his life, and his debate with Jacquelot on the problem of evil does not undermine the tenability of his position. Divine conduct is simply not susceptible to the judgments of right reason.

5. The Erring Conscience and Religious Tolerance

Bayle’s concern with conscience and toleration is not limited to the Philosophical Commentary, but it is where Bayle most clearly argues for religious toleration. He articulates two lines of argument for religious toleration: one on the basis of his doctrine of the erring conscience, as developed in the General Critique (1682) and the New Letters (1685); and one on the basis of a principle of the natural light according to which any reading of Scripture that implies a moral crime is a false reading. For Bayle, both ways of arguing for religious toleration are necessary in order to prevent coercion of, or by, people who act on the basis of conscience – whether that conscience is accurate or erring.

Bayle’s argument for religious toleration based on his doctrine of the erring conscience assumes that we have a duty and a right to act according to the lights of conscience. This is a less controversial claim when the beliefs of conscience are accurate; however, Bayle’s doctrine of the erring conscience entails that even when the beliefs of conscience are in error, the same duties and rights of conscience obtain. Bayle does place some conditions on the erring conscience’s acquiring these duties and rights; only when the erring conscience is “in good faith” – that is, when the error is sincere – does the erring conscience obtain the relevant rights and duties. Bayle consistently holds to the “good faith” requirement in both the New Critical Letters and the Philosophical Commentary; in the New Critical Letters, he writes that “[a]ll good faith errors have the same right over conscience as orthodoxy, whether we embraced those errors a bit too lightly, or whether we ran them through the most rigorous examination that we could manage.” Bayle places the good faith errors of the sincere lay person on the same footing as the good faith errors of the rigorous intellectual – and, most significantly, on the same ground as orthodoxy.

This allows Bayle to affirm a kind of moral equivalence between the accurate conscience and the erring one: whatever rights and duties accrue to an accurate conscience also accrue to the erring conscience. Thus, if the beliefs of the accurate conscience ought to be tolerated, so ought the beliefs of the erring conscience. Bayle marshals several different arguments for the moral equivalence claim, but the most powerful is the argument from skepticism. Presumably, each person cannot help but think that her conscience is in the right in cases where beliefs of conscience conflict. In the absence of definitive and objective proof for a belief of conscience, then, there is no reason to grant one conscience rights and duties over another.

A serious potential problem arises with respect to the doctrine of the erring conscience, however: the issue of fanaticism. Assuming that an erring conscience has all of the same duties and rights as an accurate conscience, what’s to prevent an individual from acting on a fanatical conscience? Bayle says in the Dictionary that it is the fanatics – the people who would benefit the most from the doctrine of the erring conscience – who support the principle that acting against one’s conscience can be a good. Bayle thus conceives of fanatics as the sort of people who are willing to subvert morality, and even the rights of their own conscience, in order to undercut the rights of others. True fanatics, however, often do not recognize that they are doing so, since they are typically convinced that they are the only people who perceive truth for what it really is. If a fanatic is convinced of his correctness – that is, that the lights of his conscience are accurate – then he will apply to himself whatever is said in favor of truth against those whom he perceives to be in error. The fanatic shifts the burden of falsity to those with whom he disagrees as a way to discharge doubt or discomfort, while simultaneously creating a double standard: an act is permissible when I do it, but not when others do. What fanatics fail to grasp when they argue for the rights of truth (presumably in order to justify the persecution of those whom they believe to be in error) is that if the roles were reversed – if the fanatics were in the minority – they would no doubt be arguing in favor of religious toleration.

This leads to Bayle’s second argument for religious toleration based on the principle of the natural light articulated in the Philosophical Commentary that forbids the commission of crimes. Bayle’s moral principle against committing crimes supports his defense of the doctrine of the erring conscience: if the accurate conscience did indeed have the right to coerce, it would only be a right considered from an abstract point of view. According to Bayle, the abstract point of view is not that of conscience; conscience provides direction for the particular beliefs and actions of a particular person. Setting aside the abstract point of view, the only way to justify coercion is by appeal to the conscience itself, whose accuracy is exactly the issue at hand. Since the only justification available to conscience is the force of its persuasion, then if the true religion were ordered by God to persecute heretics, heretics would also have the right to persecute the true religion. This scene of rampant persecution is the epitome of moral breakdown, and Bayle thinks that no such situation can be justified with an appeal to Scripture – or to conscience. Religious coercion is not only morally villainous, but it violates the very heart of all religions – and most importantly for Bayle’s readers, it violates the heart of Christianity.

Bayle’s principle of the natural light – that no reading of Scripture can be true that justifies the commission of moral crimes – adds thus moral disapprobation to any conscience-based sanction against coercion. It also provides a principle upon which those of differing consciences can agree. The revelation of the natural light that Bayle cites here – that committing crimes is always immoral no matter what the justification – comes from the faculty of right reason. Bayle argues in Diverse Thoughts that this faculty of reason, responsible for intuiting certain basic rational moral maxims, is equally accessible to both atheists and believers – whether heretical or orthodox. This implies that everyone is subject to these same moral maxims, including the absolute prohibition on using conscience as a motive to justify committing crimes. (Note, however, that this principle of the natural light only governs action – that is, it prohibits committing crimes, which is the realm of action. It gives no clear doxastic guidance outside of these basic moral maxims.)

This principle of natural light thus separates religious beliefs, where Bayle is rather permissive, from basic moral beliefs, where only right reason has sway. There are two major benefits to this separation. First, it allows Bayle to maintain that all individuals of every confession – or no confession –are subject to the same basic moral maxims, which apply equally to everyone with access to the “natural light” of right reason. Second, it allows Bayle to maintain that we may still have good reason to condemn beliefs of those with an erring conscience, but that rather than condemning those who believe erroneously, we should condemn those who profess to be in good faith but are not – a sin not merely of belief, but of action. Bayle specifically tackles this issue in his Dictionary article on Arius. The group for whom Bayle reserves his strongest condemnation in that article is not heretical teachers that are in good faith, instructing people in a simple way in accord with the teachers’ conscientious beliefs. Rather, his strongest words are for heretical teachers who teach heresy without believing it; he calls them “monsters of ambition and malice.” Presumably, the force of Bayle’s condemnation rests not on the heresy of such teachers, but on their hypocrisy – the discrepancy between belief and action.

Interestingly, for all of Bayle’s emphasis on right action over right belief, he still leaves room for a distinction between valuable and worthless beliefs. Just because Bayle insists on the primacy of right praxis over right doxa, this does not imply that all opinions are equally good. This is consistent with Bayle’s position that there is good reason to condemn false religious beliefs and to maintain orthodox beliefs. What is most unique about Bayle, however, is his redefinition of the essence of religion: what is most important is not right belief, but right action. Right action requires right reason, and right reason requires religious toleration.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Bayle, Pierre. Correspondance de Pierre Bayle. Eds. Elisabeth Labrousse & Antony McKenna. 12 vols. Oxford, 1999-2015.
- A monumental assembly of Bayle’s correspondence from February 1662 onward. Projected to extend to 20 volumes.
Bayle, Pierre. Dictionnaire historique et critique, par M. Pierre Bayle. Amsterdam, Leyde, La Haye; 1740. 5th Edition, 4 vols. in-folio.
- The work for which Bayle is most famous. The fifth edition of 1740 is the easiest to access online, at the University of Chicago’s ARTFL project (https://artfl-project.uchicago.edu/content/dictionnaire-de-bayle), but the definitive version is the second edition of 1702, which is the first to include the “Clarifications” as appendices.
Bayle, Pierre. Historical and Critical Dictionary, selections. Trans. & ed. by Richard Popkin. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1965.
- The standard contemporary edition of Bayle’s Dictionary in English, though unfortunately it includes only a small fraction of the original.
Bayle, Pierre. Œuvres diverses de M. Pierre Bayle, professeur en philosophie et en histoire à Rotterdam. La Haye/The Hague, 1727-31; Hildesheim, 1964-68. 4 vols, in-folio; Vols V.1 & V.2: Hildesheim: G. Olms, 1982-1990.
- The standard edition of Bayle’s corpus (not including the Dictionary); it includes all of Bayle’s published works, as well as some fragments of correspondence.
Bayle, Pierre. A Philosophical Commentary on These Words of the Gospel. Eds. J. Kilcullen & C. Kukathas. Indianapolis: Liberty Fund, 2005.
- The standard contemporary edition of Bayle’s Philosophical Commentary in English. The translation is an amended version of the first English translation in 1708.

b. Secondary Sources

Bost, Hubert. Pierre Bayle. Paris: Fayard, 2006.
- The definitive contemporary biography of Bayle. In French.
Brush, Craig B. Montaigne and Bayle: Variations on the Theme of Scepticism. The Hague: Nijhoff, 1966.
- An early and thorough treatment of Bayle’s skepticism.
Delvolvé, Jean. Religion, critique, et philosophie positive chez Pierre Bayle. Paris: Alcan, 1906.
- The beginning of twentieth-century scholarship on Bayle, defending a fundamentally proto-Enlightenment reading of Bayle. In French.
Hickson, Michael W. “Theodicy and Toleration in Bayle’s Dictionary” Journal of the History of Philosophy 51 (1):49-73 (2013).
- A rigorously argued, meticulously detailed treatment of the relationship between Bayle’s position on theodicy and his defense of religious toleration.
Irwin, Kristen. “Which ‘Reason’? Bayle on the Intractability of Evil,” in New Essays on Leibniz’s Theodicy, eds. Larry Jorgensen & Samuel Newlands (Oxford University Press, 2014), 43-54.
- A contextually sensitive account of Bayle’s position on theodicy. It argues that Bayle’s final position on theodicy contains the resources to reply to Leibniz’s objections.
Irwin, Kristen. “Bayle on the (Ir)rationality of Religious Belief,” Philosophy Compass 8:6 (2013), 560-569.
- An exposition of Bayle’s treatments of the rationality of religious belief.
Kilcullen, John. Sincerity and Truth: Essays on Arnauld, Bayle, and Toleration. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988.
- A masterful treatment of Bayle’s arguments defending religious toleration.
Labrousse, Elisabeth. Pierre Bayle: Hétérodoxie et rigorisme. Paris: Albin Michel, 1996. 2^nd ed.
- An especially thorough treatment of Bayle’s thought by the premier Bayle scholar of the twentieth century. In French.
Lennon, Thomas. Reading Bayle. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1999.
- The definitive treatment of Bayle’s thought in English. It argues that Bayle’s thought is deeply and irreducibly anti-systematic in nature.
Lennon, Thomas. “What Kind of a Skeptic Was Bayle?” Midwest Studies in Philosophy XXVI (2002), 258-279.
- An exceptionally clear taxonomy of the various senses in which Bayle has been thought to be a skeptic.
Maia Neto, Jose R. “Bayle’s Academic Skepticism,” Everything Connects: In Conference with R.H. Popkin, eds. J.E. Force and D.S. Katz. Leiden: Brill, 1999; 264-275.
- A compelling argument that Bayle’s skepticism is not Pyrrhonian, but fundamentally fallibilist and concerned above all with intellectual integrity.
Mori, Gianluca. Bayle philosophe. Paris: Honoré Champion, 1999.
- The most contemporary treatment of Bayle as an ironic critic of religion, and as a moral thinker focused on “common notions”. In French.
Popkin, Richard. The History of Scepticism from Savonarola to Bayle. New York: Oxford University Press, 2003.
- The definitive history of fifteenth, sixteenth, and seventeenth-century skepticism in Europe.
Sandberg, Karl C. At the Crossroads of Faith and Reason: An Essay on Pierre Bayle. Tucson: University of Arizona Press, 1966.
- A short, clear primer on the themes of faith and reason in the Baylean corpus.

Author Information

Kristen Irwin
Email: kirwin@luc.edu
Loyola University Chicago
U. S. A.

The Aesthetics of Classical Music

Musical aesthetics as a whole seeks to understand the perceived properties of music, in particular those properties that lead to experiences of musical value for the listener. It may also be understood more broadly as essentially synonymous with the philosophy of music, thus including issues of musical ontology, epistemology, ethics, and sociology. A specific area of focus within musical aesthetics is the aesthetics of classical music; it addresses questions relating to the aesthetic properties and aesthetic value of music in the Western classical tradition.

What aesthetic content does classical music have to offer? Does it consist simply in pleasing patterns, which have no meaning outside of the musical structures themselves? Can it express emotion, feeling, or other kinds of inner states? Does classical music offer insights into life not available through other art forms? Can it possess identifiable meanings, or significant conceptual, historical, or symbolic content? If so, how could this be achieved, given that its materials appear to be non-signifying in nature? These are some of the principal questions that concern the aesthetics of classical music.

After discussion of several important issues relating to classical music as an art form and an overview of influential discussions of the topic prior to the 20^th century, this article addresses these principal questions through a discussion of four major topic areas in the aesthetics of classical music: musical understanding, musical form, emotion and expressiveness, and some further types of aesthetic content in classical music.

Classical Music as an Art Form
Historical Discussions
1. Kant
2. Schopenhauer
3. Hanslick
4. Gurney
Understanding
Form
Emotion
Human Experience and Values
References and Further Reading

1. Classical Music as an Art Form

In the case of music, as in other arts, the term ‘classical’ indicates the presence of an established or long-standing tradition. While the roots of classical music extend back to Gregorian chant, three developments occurring in the 11^th century are often regarded as marking the beginning of the classical tradition in western music. These are the developments of polyphony, the principles of order, and the establishment of musical pieces as compositions. The classical tradition is centrally defined by European art music composed during the Common Practice period, which encompasses Baroque, Classical, and Romantic music (roughly 1650-1900). It also includes Medieval, Ars Nova, and Renaissance art music, as well as non-European, 20^th century, and contemporary art music that incorporates compositional practices that are recognized as being well-established in western art music. While the vast majority of compositions in Western art music unambiguously fall under the category of ‘classical music’, one can argue that, though there will be no decisive line, certain highly experimental or innovative pieces cannot be apart of an established tradition of composition and thus should not be considered ‘classical’.

In contrast to the aesthetics of popular music, the aesthetics of classical music has traditionally focused on aesthetic content that is strictly musical in nature, excluding any additional content conveyed through words, actions, visual displays, or any other non-musical elements. It has typically limited itself to inquiry into the aesthetic content in musical works that is available from music alone, considered apart from any non-musical elements. Although there are clearly topics of significant interest in the additional aesthetic qualities of classical works that include non-musical elements (whether these be semantic, poetic, dramatic, or dance-related), most philosophers writing about classical music have been unwilling to venture into this territory. The focus on music as such in the aesthetics of classical music is due to the compelling philosophical questions generated by pure or ‘absolute’ music, the complexity involved in considering music in combination with non-musical elements, and a desire to understand the art of music apart from any aesthetic content contributed from other sources. In keeping with the historical focus of the aesthetics of classical music on music as such, this article restricts itself to discussion of aesthetic content that is purely musical in nature and it does not address topics involving the combination of music with other aesthetic elements.

Several features of classical music as an art form play a central role in defining the areas of aesthetic inquiry that pertain to it. Three features in particular deserve attention. These are the unique impact classical music has on our inner experience, its temporal nature, and the central role played by the tradition of tonal harmony, even after its “collapse” at the beginning of the 20^th century.

a. Music and Inner Experience

Classical music’s ability to engage and enliven our inner experience is a primary reason why it holds so much philosophical interest. What is it about classical music as an art form that enables it to connect so strongly with our inner life? Part of the answer would seem to lie in the fact that it is an auditory art. The perception of aesthetic content through hearing differs in fundamental ways from the perception of aesthetic content through vision, especially in the case of visual arts that make use of representation. One of the greatest differences between the two modes of artistic perception is that unless we are given rather clear guidelines, we do not interpret musical sounds as representations of objects. The preexisting ability to interpret and assign meanings to visual images does not automatically come into play when we hear musical sounds. It appears that music has the capacity to engage our aesthetic sensibility without also engaging the cognition of objects. This sensibility is linked in complex ways to inner experience, feelings, moods, and emotions.

In Western philosophy, discussion of the special power of music to shape our inner life predates Plato, as evidenced by the lively debates of the pre-Socratics on this topic. Plato himself devotes substantial attention to it in both the Republic and Laws, conceiving of music as an art that can bypass reason and penetrate into our innermost self, impacting the constitution of our character. To use Plato’s terms, music acts as a “charm” on our inner life, shaping this life to its pattern. Classical music in particular stands out among musical cultures for its ability to evoke compelling inner experiences in the listener. Curiously, the power of classical works to evoke such experiences appears to be heightened in many purely instrumental works despite the fact that such pieces possess no readily identifiable meaning.

b. The Temporal Aspect of Music

In addition to its distinctive characteristics as an art form perceived through hearing, music is, of course, always temporal. Many writers, Roger Scruton among them, suggest that music leaves our minds no choice but to move with it when we listen attentively. This activity of the mind is not merely the recognition of new sounds as they occur. The mind moves sympathetically with the motion it perceives in the music. Thus, another important aspect of classical music is that frequently our mental perception of the movement in the music is so strong that we can feel it almost like we feel physical motion.

Our minds also respond to the temporal nature of music in another way. It is the automatic response of the mind to follow the progress of what it hears and assimilate this content into its conception of the piece as a whole. Music’s temporal nature entails that we do not experience the whole work at once or in an order of our choosing, and that consequently the order of presentation is fundamental to our experience of the musical content. In most classical music, and perhaps all art music of the Common Practice period, we perceive purposive and goal-directed movement along with structures and relationships that develop over time, though the scope and complexity of such content varies greatly from piece to piece. As listeners we recognize that an effort has been made to produce an aesthetic value-content, whether formal, expressive, or otherwise, worthy of appreciation or understanding. Due to this recognition, the assumption of an aesthetic attitude is a common practice in listening to classical music and thought to be an important means of enhancing our experience of the music as it unfolds.

c. Classical Music as an Historical Tradition

As an historical tradition, classical music gradually expands its artistic resources, from the practices of medieval polyphony, through the incorporation of new elements in the Renaissance, to the achievement of a conception of music and musical composition that is shared across Europe by the middle of the Baroque. The subsequent development of classical music during the Common Practice period is unique in the way that it preserves a strong continuity in compositional techniques while at the same time evolving continually as an art form. The late works from this period make use of the same basic musical materials (scales and chords) as the early ones: the diatonic scales, triadic functional harmony, primary organization around the dominant-tonic relationship, integration of vertical and horizontal dimensions, and so on. Early works differ from later ones in countless ways, but the fundamental musical materials and relationships do not change until the extended chromaticism of late romantic music begins to dissolve a sense of the tonic altogether. Later works differ from earlier ones primarily through creative innovations that are compatible with existing tonal system made by particular composers and through a gradual exploration and expansion of resources already implied in the tonal system itself. This gradual expansion within the context of a continuous tradition has significant implications for the expressive possibilities classical music possesses as an art form, allowing for the emergence of a repertoire of expressive compositional techniques that grows in effectiveness and scope as it progressively develops the potential that is inherent in tonal harmony.

The diverse compositional approaches developed in classical music in the early part of the 20^th century introduce new questions for musical aesthetics. Many aesthetic theories based on analysis of music of the Common Practice period do not apply to compositions based on approaches divergent from those used by tonal harmony. This difference in aesthetic content applies to theories of meaning, form, and expressiveness. Most influential and contemporary philosophers of classical musical aesthetics focus almost exclusively on tonal classical music (including music that achieves a tonal center by means other than tonal harmony, as found in the music of Stravinsky, Debussy, and Bartok). Given that many of these theoretical perspectives do not apply to non-tonal music, the aesthetics of non-tonal classical music is an area that is in need of further development by the discipline.

d. Musical Works and Musical Performances

There are many philosophical questions surrounding the nature and definition of music and the ontological status of works of music. However, because these questions do not apply to classical music in particular, and because the discussion of these topics benefits greatly by comparisons between different musical genres and traditions, they are more appropriately addressed under the philosophy of music or musical aesthetics in general. As a result this entry offers just a brief summary of issues concerning the definition of music, musical ontology, and authentic performance of musical works.

General definitions of music most often focus a demarcation between music and the non-musical (largely due to the musical experimentalism prominent in western art music from the 20^th century onward), and on ensuring that the diversity found in the world’s musical traditions is taken into account. These definitional questions are not pertinent to the aesthetics of classical music seeing as they focus on issues involving music outside of the classical tradition.

A similar situation exists with regard to musical ontology, though primary focus is given to works of classical music in some instances. One ontological issue pertaining centrally to classical music concerns the metaphysical nature of a work of music. Do musical works exist? If so, in what sense? With regard to musical ontology a Platonist would hold that a work of classical music is an abstract object, while a nominalist would hold that it must be understood solely in terms of particular objects that relate to it, such as the musical score. In contrast to all of these, anti-realists deny that musical works have any kind of real existence at all, though stopping short of discounting the question altogether, some anti-realists grant musical works a fictional status.

A second issue has to do with what constitutes an authentic performance of a piece. Is it sufficient to perform the right pitches and rhythms in the right order, or is more required to produce an instance of a given work? How essential to authenticity is the use of appropriate period instruments? Is a piano reduction of an orchestral score still an instance of the same work? Debate over these questions centers around which elements must be present in order for a performance to constitute an instance of the work in question. Even if a performance meets the criteria required for authenticity, there is a further question about its reception by the audience. Considering that the sensibilities of listeners continue to change, what is the significance of the fact that contemporary audiences cannot experience works as their original counterparts did?

Influential discussions of musical ontology and authentic performance as they pertain to classical music include Jerrold Levinson’s Music, Art, and Metaphysics, Lydia Goehr’s The Imaginary Museum of Musical Works, and Stephen Davies’ Musical Works and Performances.

2. Historical Discussions

Although discussion of topics relevant to Western musical aesthetics date back to the pre-Socratics, it is not until the 18^th century that musical aesthetics takes shape as an inquiry focused on the understanding of perceived properties and capacities of the art of music. Starting with early theorists such as Mattheson and progressing through to thinkers such as Kant and Schopenhauer to later writers such as Gurney, historical discussions of musical aesthetics in Western philosophy are in fact discussions of the aesthetics of classical music. This is for the simple reason that they take music of the classical tradition as their subject matter.

Many of the early discussions of classical musical aesthetics revolve around the question of what music itself is capable of presenting to the listener, with much of the debate centering on the question of how and to what extent music can convey emotional content. German and English discussions of the topic, such as those of Mattheson and Hutcheson, are typically characterized by the view that music either stimulates psychological states directly or arouses them through imitation of ways that emotion is expressed, principally by the human voice. By contrast French theorists during this early period, such as Boyé and Chabanon, oppose the idea that music is capable of expressing emotion on the grounds that it lacks the tools required for successful imitation or representation. These early writers prefigure the debates between expressionist and formalist viewpoints in later discussions of the role of emotion in the experience of classical music (see Lippman for selected excerpts from these authors and further detail on early musical aesthetics).

a. Kant

Following early explorations of the topic the first major contributor to the aesthetics of classical music is Immanuel Kant in his Critique of Judgment. In applying his aesthetic theory to music Kant’s primary concern is with the question of whether, or to what degree, music belongs to the beautiful or to the pleasing arts. Kant maintains that aesthetic judgments consist in feeling disinterested pleasure in perceiving the form of purposiveness in an object, apart from charm, emotion, or any definite concept of what the object ought to be. He further claims that the perception of the form of purposiveness puts the imagination and understanding into harmony such that they are able to freely play with one another. This state of free play, so far as it can be felt in sensation, is the basis of the pleasure that we feel in response to beauty.

Kant considers the possibility that the imagination can apprehend a form in the musical composition which, when compared by reflective judgment to the faculty of referring intuitions to concepts, places the imagination in harmony with the understanding. In music this form, apprehended independently of any conception of an object, is purely a pattern of melodic and harmonic intervals. Harmonious agreement between the imagination and the understanding in the perception of the form of the composition would, provided that this is possible, result in the music being perceived as purposive for reflective judgment. It would also mean that music deserves to be classified among the beautiful arts.

Initially Kant identifies music as an object of pure aesthetic judgments, classifying “all music without words” as a type of free, rather than dependent, beauty. In his more detailed discussion of music in sections 51-54 of his Critique of Judgment, however, Kant seems to vacillate between the possibility that music belongs to the beautiful arts and the possibility that it falls short of providing a formal content suitable for aesthetic judgments and thus is merely a pleasant art. This ultimately leaves the question of which category music belongs to undecided. If music can qualify as beautiful, the composition as a form alone must constitute the object of aesthetic judgment. Factors such as the instruments used to play the composition and the quality of their tone may add charm to the piece and they may even enhance our experience of its beauty, but by themselves such factors do not constitute objects of aesthetic judgment.

While Kant explores the possibility that the composition as an abstract pattern of relationships may present purposive form and thus qualify as beautiful, he appears to conclude that the apprehension of purposive form in music is difficult at best. In the absence of the apprehension of such form, music is limited to the pleasant rather than the beautiful, consisting primarily in a changing play of auditory sensations. In this case, music can produce enjoyment and emotion, but is not a subject for pure judgments of taste. Apart from his enormous influence on the field of aesthetics as a whole, Kant’s writing on music has been influential for its emphasis on purely formal properties and its concomitant rejection of the value of emotion and sensuous qualities to the listening experience. As such, it clearly lays the groundwork for more explicitly formalist approaches in the 19^th century.

b. Schopenhauer

Arthur Schopenhauer in The World as Will and Representation interpretes ‘will’ as the underlying metaphysical reality, as the thing-in-itself, and grants music the privileged status of presenting it. Departing from Plato and Kant, Schopenhauer denies that the underlying metaphysical reality is rational in nature. Instead, will is a blind urge whose continuous striving has no guiding purpose. Unlike the other arts, whose significance lies in the ability to capture “the permanent essential forms of the world,” thus limiting their reach to interpretations of the phenomenal realm, music expresses the will itself, directly and immediately, speaking the “universal imageless language of the heart.” While in music we experience a direct presentation of the will, nevertheless as thing-in-itself, the musical presentation of will, like will itself, is indescribable.

Despite his allegiance to Kant’s transcendental idealism, Schopenhauer’s aesthetics represents an important departure from Kant. Whereas Kant viewed the aesthetic value of music in purely formal terms as a play of patterns, Schopenhauer advocates that music is valuable for its direct expression of the continuous striving of the will. Thus, the contrasting views of Kant and Schopenhauer prefigure later debates between formalists and expressivists concerning the aesthetic properties of music.

c. Hanslick

In his influential treatise On the Musically Beautiful Eduard Hanslick argues for a strong version of aesthetic formalism that limits aesthetically valuable content to the audible analogue of a moving arabesque or kaleidoscope, differing from these only in that music “manifests itself on an incomparably higher level of ideality” and “presents itself as the direct emanation of an artistically creative spirit.” Hanslick rejects the view that music is capable of expressing emotions, holding instead that music consists purely in tonal forms that develop in time. In doing so he presents an early cognitivist account of emotions, holding that emotions are primarily defined by concepts. He claims that music is incapable of conveying the conceptual content needed to differentiate between specific emotional states. As a result, the aesthetic content of music is limited to a specifically musical kind of beauty that “consists simply and solely of tones and their artistic combination.” His conclusion is that the “representation of a specific feeling or emotional state is not at all among the characteristic powers of music.”

The production of an experience of motion is the aspect of music that is shared with emotion. Through dynamics, tempo, shape, and timbre, music can present auditory instances of qualities that accompany emotions, but no actual emotional content is present, since this would require music to convey concepts: “Music can, in fact, whisper, rage, and rustle. But love and anger occur only within our hearts.” As one might expect given his allegiance to a purely formal conception of musical value, Hanslick also rejects the idea that music as such is suitable for the representation of extramusical content.

d. Gurney

In the latter part of the 19^th century Edmund Gurney developed an approach to musical expression based on Darwinian evolutionary theory. Gurney, preceded by Herbert Spencer, postulated a biological origin of music in the impulse to attract and court a mate. According to Gurney, music originates from the capacity that evolved in our ancestors to use sounds to arouse responses from potential mates and rivals. Given that it evolved in this way, music is directly connected to the arousal of our passions. This original connection to the passions and to sexual excitement is fundamental to music in all of its forms. Emotion in classical music is a sublimation of this original sexual excitement. Its origins do not, however, constitute a link between music and extra-musical values or interests. Gurney argues that music offers a profound and entirely self-contained pleasure, whose origins grant it a special connection to our inner experience. Gurney’s work addresses many other fundamental questions in musical aesthetics, including the nature of musical motion, the basic components of musical understanding (which Gurney believed to be melodic forms), musical beauty, and musical value. It is also the inspiration for a recent work by Jerrold Levinson on the nature of musical understanding entitled Music in the Moment.

3. Understanding

Following Gurney’s claims for the role of melodic structures in musical understanding, scholars have generally agreed that an account of the nature of musical understanding must accompany any comprehensive treatment of the aesthetic properties of classical music. Musical understanding in this sense refers to how specific musical structures combine to convey an intelligible sense to the listener. As a result, this establishes a basis upon which to make further claims about the formal or expressive content of music.

a. The Listening Experience

In contemporary discussions there is general consensus that when we experience classical music, we hear the pattern of sounds as an intentional object. That is, we hear the musical work in the form of an unfolding audible musical structure. The term ‘intentional’ in this context signifies that music exists for us in virtue of its being an object of our conscious focus. Hearing patterns of sounds as music is something we contribute as listeners, since it is perfectly possible for someone not familiar with a particular kind of music to fail to grasp its aesthetic qualities. In appreciating music we hear the sounds as musical elements relating to one another within an aesthetic framework as components of a work of art. This audible musical structure together with any additional attendant qualities such as timbre, dynamics and vibrato, is the object of appreciation that produces experiences of aesthetic value. In Values of Art Malcolm Budd attempts a narrower definition that limits the aesthetic content of music to the work’s audible musical structure alone, leaving out of consideration timbral and performance-related aspects. More recently, multiple authors have presented arguments that these attendant qualities are significant aspects of the experience of aesthetic value. Regardless of these particular issues, there is a broad consensus that the experience of aesthetic value in classical music should not be considered separable from the listener’s experience of the audible musical structure of a work. It is this structure, perceived through active listening, that both contains the aesthetic content and produces the experiences of aesthetic value.

In perceiving the audible musical structure, our minds follow the succession of events and we grasp them aesthetically in relation to one another when we listen attentively. This activity of the mind is not merely the recognition of new sounds as they occur, but involves a sense of motion in the music. Given that the unfolding audible structures of classical music do not involve motion in a literal sense, the perception of motion presents a problem for the theorist.

In his pioneering treatise Sound and Symbol, Victor Zuckerkandl identifies our perception of motion as resulting from the directional tendencies present in tonal music. This includes the leading tone seeking to find resolution in or “move to” the tonic. Roger Scruton finds that while this observation is accurate, it does not capture the essence of musical motion. Scruton argues that motion must be understood as part of a system of indispensable metaphors involved in perceiving the music, and further that we perceive musical motion in spatial terms. Malcolm Budd argues that Scruton’s insistence on a spatial conception of musical movement is unnecessary and that a better approach would be to characterize music in terms of a purely temporal Gestalt, limiting music to movement in time and eliminating the need for metaphor. Scruton’s reply is that the concept of merely temporal movement is itself metaphorical in nature and that foundational metaphors such as spatial movement are also indispensable because they connect music to human experience. This allows, he claims, for the development of a complete account of music’s meaning and value.

Another topic of debate concerns the extent to which the perception of larger scale structures plays a role in musical understanding and appreciation. In agreement with the emphasis placed on the value of larger scale formal structures by Heinrich Schenker and Leonard Meyer, Peter Kivy emphasizes the architectonic aspects of the listening experience. He argues that large scale structural patterns and relationships constitute an important aspect of the expressiveness and aesthetic value experienced by the educated listener. In The Aesthetics of Music Roger Scruton also advocates for the importance of these aspects. He finds the comparison between the methods of music composition and architecture to be an apt one, though he rejects the Schenkerian claim that the surface structure of a piece is generated by its underlying large scale plan. In Scruton’s view musical understanding consists in perception of the composer’s development of the fundamental linear and vertical relationships present in tonal music, which he describes as an “order of polyphonic elaboration” that is inherent in the practices of triadic harmony. Inspired by Gurney, Jerrold Levinson disagrees, arguing instead for ‘concatenationism’, the view that basic musical understanding, together with the greater part of music’s aesthetic value, does not require perception of large scale formal relationships and that “the core experience of a piece of music is a matter of how it seems at each point.”

Related to the question of the value of perceiving larger scale formal patterns in classical music is the question of whether formal training or a certain level of education is required for the appreciation of classical music. Though scholars agree that a certain amount of acculturation is required for its understanding and appreciation, there is debate concerning the extent to which education and musical training can enhance the listener’s ability to perceive the aesthetic content of the music. Those such as Kivy who locate the primary aesthetic content of classical music in the musical form and the purely musical relationships that exist within it tend to argue that a higher level of education or acculturation is needed. On the other hand, others such as Levinson locate the primary aesthetic content in expressive qualities and in the way the music unfolds from moment to moment. They vary in their assessment of the aptitude required of the listener depending on their conception of what musical expression consists in and how it occurs.

b. Theories of Musical Meaning

Recognizing that we identify a pattern of sounds as an intentional object aids in understanding how we come to perceive the sounds produced as a form of art. However, this does not address the question of how an unfolding musical structure produces meaningful aesthetic content. An account of musical understanding requires an explanation of how the patterns and relationships present in the musical structure produce meaning for the listener.

In The Language of Music, Deryck Cooke seeks to show that certain recurrent patterns present in the music of the Common Practice period have specific emotional meanings, making it possible to construct a basic emotional vocabulary of classical music that is composed according to the principles of Common Practice tonality. Cooke further extends his analytical approach to defining emotional content contextually. If correct, his insights would establish a basis for understanding the emotional content of most classical music. Malcolm Budd and Roger Scruton have objected to Cooke’s theory on multiple grounds. They argue that it is inappropriate to construe music as a language because music lacks both a syntactic and a semantic structure, and that even if the claim to be a language is taken in a metaphorical sense, the reappearance of similar musical patterns in similar expressive contexts is not a matter of meaning, but of conventionally tested appropriateness to the context in question. Another important objection focuses on Cooke’s claim that composers use music’s vocabulary of emotions to convey the emotions that they felt when composing the work, sometimes labelled the ‘expression-transmission theory’ or simply the ‘expression theory’ of musical expression. Budd points out that by locating the value of the experience in reception of the composer’s emotions, the expression-transmission theory removes the aesthetic value from the work itself, conceiving of music as a tool for arousing the emotions of the composer in the listener. In reality, he argues, we experience aesthetic value primarily in the experience of listening to the music itself. It would misrepresent our motivation for listening to say that experiencing the emotions that the composer experienced could be a substitute for the experience of the specific aesthetic qualities found in a musical piece.

Following Cooke, a comprehensive and detailed attempt to understand how tones and rhythms produce an experience of meaningful content was made by Leonard Meyer in Emotion and Meaning in Music. Meyer, whose basic approach was further developed by Eugene Narmour, makes use of information theory in developing the thesis that a great deal of what we appreciate in classical music is the result of a sense of expectation produced by antecedent-consequent relationships. According to Meyer, a sequence of tones has musical meaning if it points to or sets up the expectation of other tones that will follow. Meyer calls this type of meaning ‘embodied meaning’, as distinguished from ‘designative meaning’ which consists in a culturally established references to some extramusical content. Largely due to his reliance on information theory, Meyer defines embodied meaning purely in terms of expectation. It is generated by directionality inherent in the diatonic scale (leading tone-tonic relationships in melodies and harmonies) as well as by expectation that is built on the listener’s familiarity with traditional forms. One of the most important instances of expectation is the perception of an incomplete pattern, leading to a desire for its fulfillment on the part of the listener.

Finding Meyer’s concept of embodied meaning to be too one dimensional and seeking to restrict musical meaning to the audible musical structure itself (that is, to the exclusion of what Meyer described as designative meanings), Budd offers the concept of ‘intramusical meaning’. This concept, Budd suggests, consists in the ensemble of musical features and relations present in an audible structure as perceived by an educated listener. In developing the concept of intramusical meaning, Budd is seeking to emphasize the abstractness of music as an art form. He wishes to establish that perceiving the audible structure of a work and the relationships that this structure contains, its intramusical meaning, is a necessary precondition for any further interpretation of a musical work. As Budd conceives of it, intramusical meaning is the most basic and fundamental characteristic of a musical piece. Budd points out that Meyer’s concept of embodied meaning is clearly does not account for the diversity of feelings generated in our experience of music of the Common Practice period. Intramusical meaning encompasses all significant relationships perceived by the listener, so it does not restrict musical meaning to a specific process, such as that of antecedent-consequent relationships. At the same time, Budd acknowledges that Meyer’s concept of embodied meaning does account for the production of responses such as anticipation, frustration, confusion, surprise, and satisfaction, with varying degrees of intensity. A potential criticism of Budd’s concept of intramusical meaning is that it places all musical meaning under a single all-encompassing category and gives no account of how specific types of structures or relationships lead to specific musical meanings.

c. Theories of Musical Symbolism

Inspired by Ernst Cassirer’s Philosophy of Symbolic Forms, in Philosophy in a New Key Suzanne Langer interprets musical understanding to consist in grasping a symbolic content rather than in the perception of discrete intramusical meanings. Langer offers a theory of musical works as “unconsummated presentational symbols.” As such, each piece of music symbolizes the form, but not the content, of a feeling. Unlike words, presentational symbols are understood only through seeking to grasp the whole, the elements of which must be interpreted in relation to each other. Pictures are presentational symbols, as are works of music. The main function of musical compositions is to symbolize feelings. Music is an unconsummated presentational symbol because it only reflects the morphology of feeling, not the content of specific feelings. If true, Langer’s theory entails that we can understand a given work as a formal abstraction of an emotional experience. In evaluating Langer’s views, Roger Scruton argues that because Langer’s unconsummated symbols do not have a specific meaning, reflecting instead only the morphology of feelings, her theory reduces to the claim that musical processes have a formal resemblance to emotional processes.

Another significant attempt to speak of music in symbolic terms was made by Nelson Goodman and given further musical focus by Monroe Beardsley. Arguing that works of art symbolize through predication rather than denotation, Goodman develops the concept of ‘exemplification’ to explain artistic expression. An instance of exemplification is one in which a predicate attaches to something which also refers to the predicate, as in a swatch of cloth from a tailor, which “exemplifies only those properties that it both has and refers to.” The difference between everyday instances of exemplification and exemplification in art is that in art the referential component is metaphorical rather than literal in nature. In applying Goodman’s concept of exemplification to music, Beardsley offers the example of a sonata whose first movement has a diffident, indecisive character. Given that it is displayed by the sonata and also plays a significant role in the piece as a whole, diffidence is an instance of musical exemplification.

d. Theories of Musical Syntax and the Influence of the Cognitive Sciences

Several notable authors sought to offer an account of musical meanings by analyzing music in terms of a musical syntax. Influenced by the structuralism of Ferdinand de Saussure, Nicholas Ruwet and Jean-Jacques Nattiez who argue that music does possess a syntax and therefore can be interpreted and understood similarly to any other system of signs. A prominent criticism of this approach argues that such an attempt will necessarily be unsuccessful because unlike the case of natural language, it does not appear to be possible to define musical structures in terms of a generative grammar. Fred Lerdahl and Ray Jackendoff seek to address precisely this issue in A Generative Theory of Tonal Music. A key issue here is whether it is possible to establish a relationship between deep structure and surface structure in music by providing transformation rules for the generation of surface structures from deep structures. In seeking to establish that music possesses a generative syntax Lerdahl and Jackendoff put forward the ‘reduction hypothesis,’ which they draw from cognitive science. This hypothesis states that we as listeners seek to organize all musical events within a piece into a “single coherent structure, such that they are heard in a hierarchy of relative importance.” Though the attempt to identify syntactic structures in music has been influential, most contemporary theorists would deny that music possesses a syntax in any robust sense.

The emphasis placed by Lerdahl and Jackendoff on how music is organized by our brains while listening shifts the focus from meaning in the music to the cognitive processes by which we understand it (though of course the two are related and both need to be accounted for). This shift makes salient the importance of supplementing philosophical investigations of musical understanding and experience with scientific approaches. Although this entry does not consider specific scientific investigations into musical cognition, it is important to acknowledge the work in areas related to understanding and experiencing music that is being done in the cognitive sciences of psychology and neuroscience. Seeing as musical understanding and experience necessarily relate to cognitive structures and processes, approaches undertaken within various subdisciplines of psychology and neuroscience offer increasingly illuminating investigations into the topics of musical meaning and musical understanding.

In assessing the potential contribution of these fields, Tom Cochrane argues that studies in psychology and neuroscience can provide additional support for one theory of our experience of music over another, as well as in some cases allow us to reframe and synthesize traditionally distinct positions. He also acknowledges the limitations of many scientific studies, which, he suggests, points to the value of an interdisciplinary collaboration between philosophy and cognitive sciences including psychology and neuroscience. A further consideration in support of scientific investigations of musical experience is the fact that philosophical authors commonly make reference to their own personal experience of music as a partial justification for their views. Scientific research into musical cognition also potentially has value for this reason. It may be a way of providing additional support for an otherwise highly subjective component of philosophical theories.

4. Form

Accounts of understanding classical music address the question of how patterns of sound generate meaning for the listener. As such, they have to do with the unfolding of these patterns in time during the listening experience and with the listener’s perception of relationships between musical ideas in the piece. Insofar as they focus on the process of understanding, they only partially address the more general question of what kind or kinds of aesthetic content a musical structure is capable of conveying. Is the aesthetic content of classical music limited to appreciation of patterns and relationships present in the formal structure, or does the musical form relate in some significant way to our experience outside of music? Is the aesthetic experience of this music primarily or wholly intellectual in nature as the cognitivist would claim, or does the listener experience the content in emotional terms through the music’s expressive qualities? The fact that music unaided by words is generally agreed to possess meaning of some sort, but does not appear to possess adequate tools for either representation or signification makes answering these questions especially challenging.

The question of whether music means or expresses anything beyond itself is present in musical aesthetics from the time of the earliest discussions of the topic in the first half of the 18^th century. Kant makes the formalist idea of limiting content to form prominent by virtue of his conception of aesthetic beauty as purposiveness without a purpose, or as the form of purposiveness. Hanslick further develops this train of thought in claiming that the aesthetic content of classical music is best understood through the analogy of a moving arabesque. Meyer emphasizes the fundamental importance of formal structures, though he acknowledges extramusical content as a legitimate aspect of some music. Influential contemporary accounts of the aesthetic value and content of the formal structure as such have been offered by Malcolm Budd, Peter Kivy, and Nick Zangwill. Underlying each of these accounts is the formalist intuition that the aesthetically significant qualities of music as an art form result from appreciation of aspects of the musical structure itself as a structure and that music, as such, has no meaning beyond the patterns and relationships present in it. While Budd ultimately appears to reserve judgment about the possibility that music could possess emotionally expressive or extramusical content in addition to the purely musical content that he advocates for. Kivy and Zangwill take a stronger stance, arguing that aesthetically significant content in music is strictly musical in nature.

a. Music as an Abstract Art

In Values of Art, Malcolm Budd characterizes music as the “art of uninterpreted sounds,” arguing that music is essentially an abstract art and that the essence of music is the audible musical structure perceived by the listener. Budd does not deny that music can contain other elements and serve other purposes. For example, when a musical instrument, passage or motif is used to signify something extramusical, or when a musical work in some fashion represents extramusical things or events, or when music is combined with other art forms. His claim is that such elements in music are not proper to the art; that they are not part of music as such. For Budd, the musical content in music is present in an abstract audible structure whose meaning is not determined by meanings in or references to the external world. In this way, music represents nothing, makes no reference to anything, and is not about anything other than itself. Budd restricts what is essential to understanding music to the perception of the audible structural patterns present in a piece and their musically significant relations with one another. All other content is excluded.

Budd calls this form the ‘musical structure’ of the piece. For Budd, music is abstract in the sense that it does not depend for its success as an art form upon a referential relation to other areas of our experience or knowledge, whether this reference be by means of representation, imitation, signification, or by some other technique that referentially links musical sounds to things in the outside world or our experience. It is important to note that in keeping with the majority of those writing in this area by placing emphasis purely on musical content, referential meanings are not given serious consideration as aesthetically significant to music as an art form. Music may possess a variety of referential meanings, from the imitation of extramusical sounds, to culturally established meanings attached either to specific types of sounds or melodies, to imitations of content supplied by a program or accompanying words. Most writers would argue, however, that such referential meanings are not proper to the aesthetic content of classical music, given that they rely for their specification on extramusical elements such as words and cultural conventions. For Budd, the musical structure alone constitutes all of the musically significant content of the music. Other elements may be added for artistic enhancement. Examples of structural elements as Budd conceives of them would include melody, rhythm, and harmony, as well as other aspects of the music judged by the listener to be musically significant, such as clearly identifiable formal patterns, relations between parts (including contrapuntal motion, imitation, etc.), harmonic texture (polyphonic, homophonic, heterophonic, etc.), variations in the number of parts and in performing forces, and the like. Audible aspects of the music including the type and quality of instrument, the quality of the performer’s technique, and the artistic choices that the performer makes are secondary to what is contained in the music apart from these factors.

In defining music as the art of uninterpreted sounds, Budd locates the strictly musical content of music first and foremost in the listener’s perception of relationships between musical structures. Hearing the music in a work consists in perceiving the relatedness of structural features. Music is an unfolding of patterns and relationships in time. Hearing music as such is primarily a dynamic experience. That is, an experience of the flow of energies generated by the temporal unfolding of pitch relationships and rhythmic patterns.

b. Musical Formalism

The claim that music is fundamentally an abstract art may be taken to mean that music contains nothing other than sounds and their relations to one another. In other words, it may be taken to mean that music possesses only formal content such that any content other than this formal content is of secondary importance and an optional addition on the part of the hearer, and hence, not part of music itself. An account of this sort would allow that musical forms can possess emotional content as an expressive property grasped through intellectual perception and that musical forms can produce an affective state in the listener in response to aesthetically significant qualities such as beauty or impressiveness (as with Gurney). However, it would deny that music expresses emotions in any normal sense of the term. Musical formalism holds instead that all aesthetic content in music is purely musical in nature. For this reason, it also denies that music is capable of conveying human experience or values, as well as any kind of broader conceptual content relating to human life.

Peter Kivy, a prominent advocate of this approach, argues that in essence music is “a quasi-syntactical structure” that is understandable solely in musical terms having “no semantic or representational content, no meaning, making reference to nothing beyond itself.” He offers a sustained argument for this viewpoint in Music Alone and develops his discussion further in New Essays on Musical Understanding. It should be noted that in advocating what he describes as ‘musical purism’, Kivy does acknowledge that music can possess some expressive features, provided that these features are non-representational, non-referential, and possess no meaning other than a purely musical one. Kivy suggests that while music neither expresses emotions nor arouses them in us, it can possess expressive properties through resemblance, much in the same way, to use Kivy’s example, we recognize sadness in the face of a St. Bernard.

A centerpiece of Kivy’s argument is his ‘contour theory’ of musical expressiveness, first articulated in The Corded Shell. Kivy argues that the experience of expressive content in music consists, not in the emotional experience of such content, but instead in the recognition of emotional qualities through a similarity between musical shape and the characteristic shape of utterances or bodily gestures. We make this association, according to Kivy, because we are psychologically determined to animate what we perceive and interpret it in human terms. The perception of emotion in music is thus public and objective in the same way it is in people.

Kivy identifies some instances of expressive content that cannot be explained by his contour model, such as our experience of the respective qualities of the major and minor modes. He argues that these instances, whatever their origin, are established by convention and hence have the same objective character as those resembling human behavioral expressions of emotion. While acknowledging the strength of Kivy’s perspective, Mark DeBellis suggests that an appeal to resemblance via contour lacks explanatory power, since to say that we perceive both music and speech or gestures as having the same expressive quality is merely to restate the problem of expressive character. DeBellis also points to the possibility of music resembling human actions that cause emotion rather resembling the expression of the emotion itself, as in satisfaction resulting from the perception of struggle followed by resolution. He questions whether Kivy’s claims about the conventional nature of the major and minor modes can be verified. More recently Kivy has modified his position to one of “enhanced formalism,” holding that pure instrumental music is a “black box” regarding the question of how it comes to possess expressive properties and suggesting that the important question is instead that of understanding the role that these properties play in the formal structure.

Following a similar conception of music’s aesthetic content to that of Kivy, and in agreement with Scruton concerning the metaphorical nature of our descriptions of musical qualities, Nick Zangwill argues for the ‘aesthetic metaphor thesis’. This thesis holds that, except in exceptional cases, emotion descriptions of music are metaphorical descriptions of music’s aesthetic properties. Thus, just as we say without controversy that a passage is delicate, in the same metaphorical manner we can also describe a musical passage as serene. Zangwill acknowledges that we do have intensely valuable aesthetic responses to some works of music, but denies that these responses are emotional in nature. The mistake, according to Zangwill, is to take our metaphorical descriptions literally and confuse the feelings involved in experiencing music with emotions. In agreement with Kivy, Zangwill holds that absolute music cannot evoke ‘garden variety’ emotions and argues instead that in listening to music, we experience specifically aesthetic feelings which share some, but not all of the features found in actual emotional experiences.

c. Beauty, the Sublime, and Sensuous Pleasure

Regardless of the stance taken on whether or not music is capable of expressing emotions or other types of extramusical content, there is universal agreement among theorists that classical music offers unique and highly valuable experiences of musical beauty. Historically, the predominant tendency has been to limit musical beauty to the perception of relationships existing in the formal structure of the work, excluding its sensuous qualities. The most common type of musical beauty attributed to classical music is found in melody. The great majority of individually identifiable melodies that we describe as beautiful possess certain characteristics that are easily recognizable. These include a predominantly conjunct motion, graceful contours, elegance of design, a duration such that the whole can be grasped in the listener’s immediate awareness, a sense of arrival or return toward the end of the melody, a moderate to slow tempo, and a song-like quality in the production of the sound and phrasing (such as bel canto style, for example). The details of style evolve over time, but these general characteristics hold for beautiful melodies throughout the Common Practice period and beyond, as well as for instances of melodic beauty that predate Common Practice tonality. Musical beauty in the sense of patterns pleasing to the intellect and imagination may also be found in the perception of larger scale musical forms. Assessment of the significance of these vary depending on the weight granted to architectonic features in the musical experience. At the very least, certain readily perceivable formal structures such as those present in canons and harmonic ostinatos can be included uncontroversially in standard aspects of musical beauty in classical music. Well-crafted ‘counterpoint’ is a third commonly identified type of musical beauty. At slower tempos and especially in lower registers counterpoint is also acknowledged by many theorists to contribute to perceptions of musical profundity.

Closely related to musical profundity is experience of the sublime. In classical musical aesthetics, as with other arts, the sublime is usually taken to refer to evocation of that which is beyond human comprehension. In keeping with Edmund Burke’s influential analysis, the experience of sublimity in classical music is most often associated with feelings such as awe, astonishment, obscurity, and terror. Musical passages have been considered to evoke the sublime through qualities. These qualities include complexity, whether of overall design or of interaction between musical elements, emotional expression and mood, which may involve intense conflict or turbulence, but could also be present as transcendence or otherworldliness, and creative power either from an impression of the composer’s creative power in the scope or impressiveness of the work or through qualities evoking creativity in the work itself (as in a fantasia).

In contrast to the traditional focus on formal qualities, classical musicians themselves, as well as contemporary listeners to classical music, would almost universally include sensuous qualities as important contributors to musical beauty and sublimity. Indeed, a primary goal for the classical musician is to develop beauty of tone. Additionally timbres and coloristic effects play an increasingly important role in classical compositions starting in the latter part of the 19^th century, as seen in musical impressionism and minimalism, as well as in the expanded palette available through the use of greater and more varied performing forces from the Romantic period onward. For these reasons it seems difficult to deny that tone quality and the listener’s experience of both successive and simultaneous combinations of timbres should be possible objects of musical beauty and contributors to the experience of musical sublimity. In the case of sublimity, dynamics and texture would also seem to have an important role, as would, in some instances, articulation and attack. A further question would be the extent to which virtuosic elements and displays of musical virtuosity by soloists constitute or enhance beauty or sublimity in music. A common analogy notes that such displays are the auditory equivalent of fireworks.

5. Emotion

Can music possess expressive content in a more substantial way than in the intellectual recognition of resemblances to human expressive behavior in purely structural qualities, as the cognitivist would suggest? Theories addressing this question can be classed into several categories, as follows. Transmission-expression theories such as Deryck Cooke’s claim that the emotions experienced in the music are those experienced by the composer. Arousal theories claim that the music’s expressiveness consists in its ability to move the listener to have an affective response. Resemblance theories claim that musical expressiveness lies in perception of a similarity between the way the music sounds and the way emotions feel. Mirroring response theories claim that expressiveness lies in the music itself rather than originating in the composer or being located in the listener. Nevertheless, these theories claim that listeners often mirror the emotional qualities that the music expresses, though their doing so is not required for the music to be considered expressive. Imaginative response theories claim that we experience music as expressive by imagining that the emotions we perceive in it belong to an indeterminate persona (since the music itself cannot be the possessor of emotions). Accordingly, to hear emotion in music is to hear it as the expression of feelings by an imagined individual. A related approach emphasizes the metaphorical nature of expression without attributing it to an imagined persona. Sympathy theories emphasize our sympathetic engagement in the music and corresponding enhanced recognition of its qualities.

Although the literature is less extensive, theorists have also examined the presence and role of moods in classical music. ‘Mood’ here refers to the feeling of a state or states that persist over a significant period of time and have the capacity to color our attitude toward all of the musical content that we hear while they are being felt. It is generally assumed that moods differ from emotions not only in that they apply globally, but also in their lack of an intentional object. Although it is difficult to claim that moods contain much expressive content themselves, they may set the stage for the experience of more specific kinds of expressive content. Thus, a joyous mood might set the stage for feelings of triumphant arrival, a somber one for mourning and loss. Noel Carroll proposes that moods in music can offer a solution to the debate between formalists and arousalists, conceding to the formalist that music lacks the tools to represent the kinds of objects emotions require while granting to the arousalist the point that music can arouse “affective states that are objectless, global, [and] diffuse.” Peter Kivy disagrees, claiming that while there are certainly experiential differences between moods and emotions, they are identical in regard to how music can be expressive of them.

a. Association and Arousal Theories

Leonard Meyer combines his account of musical meaning with a theory of affective arousal. Building on the theory of emotions developed by John Dewey (whose aesthetics offers illuminating applications to classical music even though it does not consider classical music specifically), Meyer claims that emotion is evoked “when a tendency to respond is inhibited.” This situation occurs in classical music in innumerable instances when composers establish expectations, then delay the satisfaction of these expectations, as in delayed arrival on the tonic, or failure to complete a pattern that has been initiated. These examples, and countless others like them found throughout the fabric of classical compositions, trigger an affective response by establishing an expectation of fulfillment, then inhibiting that expectation. Meyer claims that this affective response can be either undifferentiated, in which case only a “feeling tone” is present (perhaps akin to purely musical feelings), or differentiated into a specific emotion by the listener in a process of imaginative association. Meyer’s theory is thus an arousal theory in its conception of affective response and an association theory in its account of the experience of specific emotions by the listener. However, as Malcolm Budd and numerous others have observed, in order to be aesthetically significant expressive content must be a product of properties perceived in the music itself. Consequently, expressive content cannot be the product of an association between the music and some extramusical content that defines or shapes our experience of it.

More recently Jenefer Robinson has advanced another version of the arousal theory, arguing that music has the ability to excite physiological arousal directly in the listener. According to Robinson, the listener attaches an emotional label to the state of arousal after this arousal takes place. Making a claim similar to that of Meyer in his theory of emotional differentiation, this label is governed by the context that the listener brings to the listening experience. Following the contributions of Robinson, many theorists now accept that arousal plays a role in the experience of classical music, even if it is only part of a more complete account. Peter Kivy figures as an exception by taking a formalist point of view, suggesting that to interpret our inner state as an emotional one after the fact is optional at best, and furthermore, is not the type of listening that appreciates what music as an art form has to offer.

b. Resemblance Theories

In his Music and the Emotions, Malcolm Budd reviews and rejects many of the prominent theories of musical expressiveness. In his Values of Art, Budd offers an argument for a “basic and minimal concept” of what the expression of emotion in music consists in. According to Budd, the expression of emotion in music amounts to hearing the music as sounding the way an emotion feels. Thus, the core element in the emotional expressiveness of music is the listener’s perception of a likeness between what is in the music and the experience of a particular emotion. In Budd’s view, this basic “cross-categorical likeness perception” must underlie any account of the expression of emotion in music. However music is expressive of emotion, the expression of emotion must always rely at bottom upon the perception of the music as sounding like the way emotions feel. Budd goes on to identify three likely “accretions” to this “basic and minimal account,” but does not commit himself to any one view. First, the music may induce the feeling whose likeness is perceived. Second, the perception of a likeness to emotional experience may be accompanied by listeners imagining an occurrence of the perceived feeling in themselves. Third, instead of imagining experiencing the feelings that are perceived in the music, the listener may imagine that the music is an instance of these feelings rather than the feelings of any specific individual.

In The Aesthetics of Music Roger Scruton classifies Budd’s idea of a cross-categorical likeness perception, Langer’s conception of music as an unconsummated presentational symbol, and Kivy’s contour theory as versions of what he calls ‘the resemblance theory’. Scruton argues that all versions of the resemblance theory will be unsatisfactory for two reasons. First, resemblance theories confuse expression with the means by which it is achieved (as with other arts such as poetry, music does not resemble what it expresses). Second, if resemblance involves recognizing expression without requiring that we experience something of value as a result of it (as Kivy would have it), then successful expression may occur in an aesthetically uninteresting piece of music and it is unclear why the musical presentation of expression would have any special value.

Approaching the problem of expressiveness from another angle, Stephen Davies endorses a contour model similar to Kivy’s, but also emphasizes the centrality of the listener’s response to the perceived expressive properties. Thus, experiencing expressive content involves a ‘mirroring response’ in which the listener experiences an emotion similar to that perceived in the musical structure, though the music itself is not thought to arouse this emotion directly or in a mechanical way.

In his recent Critique of Pure Music James Young advances versions of both arousal and resemblance theories as components of his anti-formalist position, Arguing in a manner similar to Budd, but in greater detail, he claims that that music arouses emotions through the resemblance the listener perceives between the experience of music and the experience of human behavior expressive of emotions. Identifying this process as the result of a ‘cross-domain mapping,’ Young follows an approach similar to that recommended by Tom Cochrane in drawing on empirical studies of listener responses as well as theories of brain function.

c. The Role Imagination and Metaphor

Jerrold Levinson focuses on the imaginative contribution of the listener in offering an account of hearing music as drama. Heard as drama, music consists in the interplay of forces within a piece, energies or impetuses within the piece whose interaction involves qualities such as tension, suspense, assertion, struggle, and conflict. Levinson suggests that when we hear music as drama, we imagine the dramatic actions and motivations to belong to indeterminate personae or person-like agents. He acknowledges that this way of listening adds an optional layer of content not strictly derivable from the music itself.

Aaron Ridley takes an approach similar to Levinson in regards to the imagination of indeterminate personae, but places special emphasis on the melismatic gesture in classical music as a primary vehicle of emotional expressiveness. Ridley argues that the melismatic gesture “resembles items in the expressive repertoire of extramusical human behavior, either physical or vocal,” thus allowing the music to present states of feeling which the listener experiences through a sympathetic response to the music. Following the contributions of Levinson and Ridley several theorists, Scruton among them, have suggested that the introduction of an imagined persona is unnecessary and that the musical entities themselves qualify as dramatic agents interacting with one another.

Much of western classical music from the Common Practice period can easily be characterized as inherently dramatic in nature, involving development, struggle, and resolution, due to its fundamental reliance on the tonic-dominant relationship. This relationship allows for multiple large and small scale instances of motivic development, of tension and resolution, departure and return, and movement and rest to occur within the context of a single piece. The tension found in the dominant seventh, as well as in other chords that function similarly, places the listener in a state of suspense and instills a desire for resolution. Tonal harmony exploits the dynamic qualities of chords within a given harmonic context to create tension, suspense, expectation, and surprise. It is worth noting that conceiving of music as a dramatic art would seem to shift the emphasis away from the value of a particular content in the music itself and toward the experience of dramatic qualities by the listener. Provided that we give ourselves over to it fully, a highly dramatic work may allow us to experience a form of catharsis and perhaps a state of exhausted repletion following the experiences of tension, suspense, and fulfillment.

Roger Scruton focuses on the listener’s sympathetic participation in the music in his account of musical expressiveness. He begins by suggesting that, because music cannot express exact states of mind, transitive notions of expressiveness give way to an intransitive conception of it. As a result, the import of expression in music lies in the listener’s response. Scruton claims that the listener’s response to expressive music is essentially a sympathetic one, a response to “human life, imagined in the sounds we hear.” For Scruton, the sympathetic response includes not only feelings, but actions and gestures as well. In order to hear music with understanding, we must move with it internally. Ultimately, for Scruton, our sympathetic response, our ‘moving with’ the music, is defined by the fact that music avoids explicit statement, while still inviting the listener to ‘enter into’ its expressive content. The experience of musical expressiveness consists in hearing it as “metaphorical movements in a metaphorical space.” The sounds are heard as figurative life, so that “you are the music while the music lasts.” In addition, though he does not believe it expresses any kind of cognitive content, Scruton suggests that the expressive qualities of a significant musical work can allow us to rehearse emotions that are otherwise very hard to feel.

Like Scruton Christopher Peacocke gives a central place to metaphor in the experience of musical expressiveness. In a recent influential paper, Peacocke suggests that when music is heard as expressing a particular property, some feature of it is heard “metaphorically-as” that property. Offering a non-linguistic account of metaphor informed by current accounts in cognitive science, Peacocke argues that in listening to music metaphor “is exploited in the perception, rather than being represented.” Thus when a piece of music succeeds in expressing a particular property, some of its features are perceived metaphorically-as possessing some of the characteristics of this property. This may occur at a single moment, or through the development of the music over time.

In a reply to Peacocke, Malcolm Budd contrasts his characteristically minimalist account of metaphorical content as the listener capturing some character of the music as he perceives it, with Peacocke’s account of the perceived property as a constituent of the intentional content of the listener’s perception. Budd questions what information a metaphorical-as constituent of a perception carries. He suggests that if it is no information, then the claim of metaphorical-as perception to cognitive status lapses. Kivy also raises questions about Peacocke’s account, asking the normative question of what metaphorical readings are permissible in Peacocke’s sense of metaphorically-as. He worries that it is unclear whether the account places limits on what can be heard metaphorically-as, leaving open the possibility that anything is permissible.

d. The Expression of Negative Emotions

The traditional question of the value of negative emotions in aesthetic experience applies to classical music as it does to the other arts. However, the question involves additional challenges in the case of pure music if one considers such music to be both abstract and highly expressive. In arguing for a specifically musical emotion that is both pleasurable to experience and universal to all aesthetically significant works of music, Gurney sidesteps the issue altogether. Nelson Goodman addresses the question by suggesting that in aesthetic experience “emotions function cognitively,” meaning that we use emotions to understand the aesthetic content of the work. In an influential essay entitled “Music and Negative Emotion” Jerrold Levinson accepts the suggestion made by Goodman and argues that Aristotle’s original claim of catharsis also has substantial merit in the case of classical music. Beyond these he identifies six additional “rewards” that may be associated with listening to music expressive of negative emotions, most having to do with benefits associated with experiencing and understanding emotions, either ours or another’s. Stephen Davies, by contrast, suggests in Musical Meaning and Expression that there is no real difference between our willingness to expose ourselves to negative emotions in music and our willingness to do so in other areas of life, so the question is more about our response to the human condition than it is about listening to music. A related possibility is that negative emotions in music offer a truthful reflection of our experience outside of music, and that we value such music in part because it affirms a reality we experience in our lives.

6. Human Experience and Values

Beyond the claim for emotionally expressive content in music, some writers have suggested that classical music possesses content that reflects aspects of human experience and values that surpass the expression of emotion, mood, and feeling, or the interplay of imagined personae. Wilhelm Dilthey and Jean-Paul Sartre both make such claims for music, and kindred claims can also be found in the writings of a number of contemporary aestheticians. However, while claims for a more significant human content in music resonate with many people, they have found only limited support among theorists because it has proven difficult to sustain an argument for the presence of this kind of content in music alone without tying the aesthetic claims to a larger philosophical framework that itself makes claims about human experience and values.

a. Dilthey and Music as the Expression of Lived Experience

Wilhelm Dilthey offers one of the most suggestive approaches to the expression of content holding a larger human significance in his late hermeneutical writings, especially in his discussion of musical understanding in “The Understanding of Other Persons and Their Manifestations of Life.” Dilthey’s argument for the expression of human experience in music depends upon a specific conception of what artistic expression consists in. Like Hegel, Dilthey holds that the psyche must obtain self-knowledge by objectifying itself. Unlike the literary, dramatic, and visual arts, however, music alone cannot make use of things or images from the shared external world, nor can it make use of the ability of words and images to refer to the inner world of emotions, perceptions, thoughts, and ideas. Instead, Dilthey argues, music transforms lived experience into a form of expression all on its own in a way that that opens up areas of human experience not accessible to the other arts.

The composer does not translate feelings that arose outside of music into musical terms. Rather the composer develops a capacity for specifically musical feelings through immersion in a musical tradition, in this case the tradition of Common Practice tonality together with all of the expressive techniques developed within this framework by individual composers. This capacity allows the composer to transform non-musical experiences into musical ones. Unlike most other expressive arts, music does not achieve its meanings through signification or representation. Instead, the capacity for musical feelings, as developed in relation to a musical tradition, takes the place of the capacity for signification found in language or that of representation found in the visual arts. Every art requires some vehicle or means through which to pursue the goal of appropriating the human world. In the case of music, Dilthey suggests, this vehicle is a capacity for musical feelings developed within a specific cultural tradition.

Expressions of lived experience in music, then, are expressions, not just of the uniquely individual experience of the composer, but of individuality perceived against a particular cultural-historical background. Expressions of lived experience express not only the individuality of the composer’s experience, but also the composer’s experience as it is determined by cultural and historical factors. As Edward Lippman points out, a primary reason why Dilthey is able to develop his argument as he does is that he interprets the arts as a whole in relation to a conception of interconnected cultural systems that are themselves part of the “overall nexus of life.” It is only because classical music consists in a tradition that is interwoven into this nexus that it can transform lived experience into an object of artistic expression.

b. Sartre, Adorno, and Music as a Social Force

Offering a major revision of the theory of music that he presents in The Psychology of the Imagination, Jean-Paul Sartre argues in “The Artist and His Conscience” that rather than consisting in an object of ideal beauty, music instead expresses cultural-historical values. Sartre explores the musical work as a historical and cultural totality, which simultaneously reflects and transcends its time. He identifies music as a “non-signifying art,” one that does not refer beyond itself, but nevertheless possesses a meaning. This meaning cannot be adequately expressed by any system of signs, but instead “is always a matter of a totality, a totality of a person, a milieu, time, or human condition.” Sartre’s focus in this essay is upon the possibility of music as a committed art form, by which he understands an art form that furthers human freedom. As George Bauer points out, for Sartre the goal of the musician is to find a means of “revealing the liberty of the human condition within his compositions–even to the untutored.”

Sartre’s basic claim is that the aesthetic choices a composer makes reflect the values of the composer’s cultural-historical context. Although Sartre does not deny that music is capable of reflecting the individual values of the composer, he is primarily interested in the way that music reflects, and possibly allows for the transcendence of, the human situation in a particular time and place. Sartre’s claim stems from the intuition, present in Western philosophical thinking about music since the time of Plato, that music has social and political implications, that it can be a transformational force and a potential threat to the established order.

Like Sartre, Theodor Adorno interprets strictly musical qualities in classical music to have social and political implications. Although his influential sociological interpretation and critique of classical music lies outside the scope of the aesthetics of classical music, in his writings on specific composers Adorno identifies political and social implications in classical music as well as other significant human content in the composer’s treatment and alteration of musical conventions. In his writing on Mahler, Adorno argues that a social critique is evident in the relationship the composer establishes between the individual theme and the larger symphonic form. Traditionally conceived as a problem in Mahler, Adorno claims that in fact Mahler’s liberation of individual themes from ties to the larger formal structure establishes an “archaic banality,” akin to improvisation, which is “located prior to the constitution of the harmonically symmetrical relationships and corrodes them.” Seen in this light the true significance of Mahler is that he is “using the archaically corroded material of romanticism … in protest against the bourgeois symmetry of form.” Against this symmetry he opposes “the free contours of the freshly trodden landscape of the imagination.” Thus, Adorno finds in Mahler’s alteration of conventional musical relationships a subversion of the bourgeois order, which is capable of elevating the social awareness of the listener.

Adorno finds another kind of human significance in the late style of Beethoven, arguing that his late style reveals the ultimate inability of art to address the human condition. The traditional view held that Beethoven’s late work reflects “an uninhibited subjectivity … which breaks through the envelope of form to better express itself.” Against this view Adorno argues that in Beethoven’s works generally, rather than breaking through form, the composer’s subjectivity creates it. The middle Beethoven transforms his musical materials according to his intention, freeing them from convention through the compositional uniqueness that he achieves. The late Beethoven, by contrast, makes use of “conventions that are no longer penetrated and mastered by subjectivity, but simply left to stand.” According to Adorno these conventional materials exist in a fractured landscape that reflects the composer’s encounter with mortality: “the finite powerlessness of the I confronted with Being.” Thus, Adorno concludes, “[i]n the history of art late works are catastrophes.”

c. Contemporary Theories

More recently, Patricia Herzog has argued that purely instrumental music can convey content of profound significance to human life and that the value of such music resides largely in the value of the content that is conveyed. Purely formal accounts of music overlook this content and consequently cannot offer insight into the most important aspects of musical value. In Herzog’s view, music criticism must seek to articulate aesthetic value by grasping human values in music. Drawing on the work of Edward Cone and Joseph Kerman, Herzog bases her argument on the intuition that music contains a significance to human life that cannot be grasped by limiting the study of music to intramusical relations and any expressive content these abstract forms may yield.

Herzog claims that grasping purely intramusical meanings will never answer the important questions about music, since such meanings fail to provide a sufficiently rich interpretive vocabulary and “do not generate categories that tell us why music matters.” These questions must be answered through an evaluative connection to the music, one that links the music to human interests. For Herzog, the best works of classical music possess a recognizable conceptual content of human significance. The profundity of this content plays a major role in determining the work’s aesthetic value. Aaron Ridley also claims that music can convey a profound content. Drawing on the music criticism of J.W.N. Sullivan and echoing Dilthey, Ridley argues that a certain works of classical music convey the depth and quality of the artist’s experience of life and that through listening to them the music gives us the opportunity “to grasp, or at least to gain an inkling of, a state of soul or an outlook of extraordinary depth.” Arguing against positions such as those of Herzog and Ridley, in Music Alone Peter Kivy questions whether it is possible to articulate the profundity of music. Kivy suggests that the profundity of music can only be possessed directly through the listening experience. He agrees that music matters, but denies that its profundity consists in a content that can be articulated in terms of human experience and values. Kendall Walton takes a more moderate approach to extramusical content in purely instrumental music, proposing that while music does not, as some have suggested, call for imaginative interpretations of musical content in non-musical terms, it does call for “imaginative introspection”. This means that in the listening experience we imagine feeling particular emotions tied to the content of the music. Walton also suggests that music presents non-psychological properties such as struggle and achievement. According to Walton music’s reference to extramusical realities, though imprecise, is important to explaining the power of music as an art form.

In The Aesthetics of Music Roger Scruton holds that we hear music as purposeful “in the manner of human intention,” and thus events are not just perceived as movement, but as action (though he rejects the need for reference to an imaginary subject). Scruton argues that because we experience music as “figurative life,” music embodies and transmits the values of the culture that produces it. When we enter into the music through sympathetic listening, we rehearse the patterns of emotions that correspond to those values. Like Plato, Scruton suggests that music exercises an influence on our character. He draws an analogy to dance and its evolution from the Baroque period onward, Scriton claims that through the feelings it causes us to experience in our sympathetic engagement with its gestures, classical music educates our emotions, in contrast to popular music, which increasingly represents the decline of Western musical culture, a progressive movement toward disorder lead by the sexual impulse. Appreciating classical music, Scruton argues, is a form of latent dancing so that “the search for objective musical values is one part of our search for the right way to live.”

Theories that find music alone to be capable of expressing aspects of human experience and values must account for how an apparently abstract art can convey such content. Though attempts continue to be made to explain how music achieves this kind of result, most theorists find the attempts made to date to be unsatisfactory. Dilthey’s hermeneutical account would appear to be among the most well developed, but it relies upon additional assumptions about the nature of artistic expression and the compositional process that most theorists would not accept, or at the very least would find to be in need of significant additional exploration. Thus, while theories claiming the expression of human experience and values appeal to the common intuition that certain works of classical music possess a meaning that has larger implications for human life, definitive identification of such meanings has proven to be elusive.

7. References and Further Reading

Adorno, Theodor. “Late Style in Beethoven.” Trans. Susan Gillespie. Raritan 13:1 (1993):102-06.
- A reinterpretation of the meaning of stylistic qualities in Beethoven’s late works.
Adorno, Theodor. “Mahler Today.” Essays on Music: Theodor Adorno. Ed. Richard Leppert. Trans. Susan Gillespie. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2002.
- Advances the claim that Mahler’s deviation from the thematic techniques of tonal harmony should be understood as an artistic subversion of the Bourgeois order.
Bauer, George Howard. Sartre and the Artist. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1969.
- An analysis of Sartre’s use of art and artists to convey his conception of the difference between being and existence as it relates to art.
Beardsley, Monroe. “Understanding Music.” On Criticizing Music: Five Philosophical Perspectives. Ed. K. Price. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1981.
- Extends Goodman’s concept of exemplification to music.
Budd, Malcolm. Music and the Emotions. London: Routledge, 1985.
- A penetrating critical examination of influential theories of emotion in music, including those of Hanslick, Gurney, Schopenhauer, Cooke, Langer, and Meyer.
Budd, Malcolm. “Musical Movement and Aesthetic Metaphors.” British Journal of Aesthetics 43:3 (2003): 209–23.
- Argues against Scruton’s account of musical motion in terms of spatial metaphors understood metaphorically, suggesting it is favorable to conceive of musical motion in terms of a purely temporal Gestalt.
Budd, Malcolm. “Response to Christopher Peacocke’s ‘The Perception of Music: Sources of Significance.’” British Journal of Aesthetics 49:3 (2009): 289-92.
- An evaluation of Peacocke’s conception of the role of metaphor in music.
Budd, Malcolm. Values of Art. London: Penguin, 1995.
- Compliments his earlier work with the addition of a “basic and minimal” conception of emotion in music as well as an exploration of the value of music as an art form.
Carroll, Noël. “Art and Mood: Preliminary Notes and Conjectures.” The Monist 86:4 (2003): 521-555.
- Explores the possibility that musical moods can offer a solution to the debate between formalist and arousalist positions.
Clifton, Thomas. Music as Heard: A Study in Applied Phenomenology. New Haven, Conn.: Yale University Press, 1983.
- Considers the experience of music from a phenomenological perspective.
Cochrane, Tom. “Music, Emotions and the Influence of the Cognitive Sciences.” Philosophy Compass 5:11 (2010): 978–88.
- Suggests that psychology and neuroscience can provide additional support for one theory of our experience of music over another, as well as in some cases allow us to reframe and synthesize traditionally distinct positions.
Cone, Edward T. The Composer’s Voice. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1974.
- Argues for a theory of musical communication based on the composer’s musical personae.
Cook, Nicholas. Music, Imagination, and Culture. Oxford: Clarendon, 1990.
- Examines music from the point of view of the composer and the listener, arguing that the role of the listener is of primary importance.
Cooke, Deryck. The Language of Music. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1964.
- Seeks to show that certain recurrent patterns present in the music have specific emotional meanings, making it possible to construct a basic emotional vocabulary of classical music.
Dahlhaus, Carl. The Idea of Absolute Music. Trans. Roger Lustig. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1989.
- A hermeneutical inquiry into the history of our conception of absolute music.
Davies, Stephen. Musical Meaning and Expression. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1994.
- A comprehensive discussion of major issues in musical aesthetics, including a presentation of his mirroring response theory of musical expression.
Davies, Stephen. Musical Works and Performances. Oxford: Clarendon, 2001.
- An in-depth exploration of the nature of musical works and of authenticity in musical performances.
Davies, Stephen. Musical Understandings and Other Essays on the Philosophy of Music. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2011.
- A collection of essays addressing the listener’s response to the expression of emotion in music, the role of the listener in the perception and understanding of music, as well as other central issues in musical aesthetics.
DeBellis, Mark. “Music.” The Routledge Companion to Aesthetics. Ed. Berys Gaut and Dominic McIver Lopes. New York: Routledge, 2001.
- An overview of major topics in musical aesthetics.
Dilthey, Wilhelm. Selected Works, Vol. 3: The Formation of the Historical World in the Human Sciences. Ed. Rudolf Makkreel and Frithjof Rodi. Princeton: Princeton Univeristy Press, 2002.
- Contains Dilthey’s late hermeneutical approach to musical aesthetics in the essay “The Understanding of Other Persons and Their Manifestations of Life.”
Goehr, Lydia. The Imaginary Museum of Musical Works. Oxford: Oxford Univeristy Press, 1994.
- Offers a genealogy of the concept of a musical work from antiquity onward, arguing that no analytic method can succeed in defining musical works and that before 1800 compositions and performances were not governed by the work concept.
Goldman, Alan. “The Value of Music.” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 50:1 (1992): 35–44.
- Argues that music presents us with another world, separate from everyday life.
Goodman, Nelson. Languages of Art. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1968.
- Highly influential work exploring the nature of musical expression and the relationship between works and performances.
Gracyk, Theodore and Andrew Kania, eds. The Routledge Companion to Philosophy and Music. New York: Routledge, 2011.
- A comprehensive guide to major topics and thinkers in musical aesthetics.
Gurney, Edmund. The Power of Sound. New York: Basic Books, 1966.
- A monumental study drawing on evolutionary theory to analyze the nature of musical expression.
Hanslick, Eduard. On the Musically Beautiful. Trans. Geoffrey Payzant. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1986.
- Classic treatise in musical aesthetics, arguing that aesthetic value in music is purely formal in nature.
Herzog, Patricia. “Music Criticism and Musical Meaning.” Journal of Aesthetics and Arts Criticism 53: 3 (1995): 299-312.
- Makes the case for content of a profound human significance in classical music.
Kant, Immanuel. Critique of Judgement. Trans. J.H. Bernard. New York: Hafner, 1951.
- A foundational text in aesthetics; evaluates whether music is a proper object of aesthetic judgements.
Kivy, Peter. The Corded Shell. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1980.
- Presents the author’s contour theory of musical expressiveness, supplemented by a convention theory that accounts for our responses to those aesthetic qualities not addressed by the contour theory.
Kivy, Peter. “Mood and Music: Some Reflections for Noël Carroll.” The Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism, 64:2 (2006): 271-281.
- Assesses Carroll’s account of the evocation of moods in classical instrumental music.
Kivy, Peter. Music Alone: Philosophical Reflections on the Purely Musical Experience. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1990.
- Considers the experience of textless instrumental music, clarifying and defending the author’s cognitivist position.
Kivy, Peter. New Essays on Musical Understanding. Oxford: Clarendon, 2001.
- A collection of essays addressing historical topics, emotional expression, and concatenationism vs. architectonicism.
Langer, Susanne K. Philosophy in a New Key. New York: Mentor, 1956.
- Argues that works of music should be understood as unconsummated presentational symbols and as such symbolize.
Levinson, Jerrold. Music, Art, and Metaphysics. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1990.
- An influential work containing six essays on musical aesthetics and covering topics such as the definition, ontology, meaning, performance, and appreciation of music.
Levinson, Jerrold. “Music as Narrative and Music as Drama.” Mind and Language 19:4 (2004): 428-441.
- Argues that that it is natural to hear music as drama and that doing so benefits from the introduction of an imagined persona, while attempting to hear it as narrative poses significant problems.
Levinson, Jerrold. Music in the Moment. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1997.
- Presents a sustained argument for concatenationism.
Lippman, Edward. A History of Western Musical Aesthetics. Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press, 1992.
- A thorough survey of influential figures, with an emphasis in its 20^th century coverage on continental aesthetics.
Lippman, Edward. Musical Aesthetics: A Historical Reader. 3 vols. New York: Pendragon Press, 1986.
- An excellent source book in musical aesthetics.
Meyer, Leonard B. Emotion and Meaning in Music. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1961.
- A foundational inquiry into musical meaning, focusing on expectation generated by antecedent-consequent relationships.
Meyer, Leonard B. Music, the Arts, and Ideas. Chicago: University of Chicago Press,
- Reworks central aspects of the theory presented in Emotion and Meaning in Music.
Narmour, Eugene. The Analysis and Cognition of Basic Melodic Structures. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1990.
- A further development of the basic approach established by Meyer.
Nattiez, Jean-Jacques. Music and Discourse: Toward a Semiology of Music. Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1990.
- Argues that music possesses a syntax and thus can be interpreted similarly to any other system of signs.
Peacocke, Christopher. “The Perception of Music: Sources of Significance.” British Journal of Aesthetics 49:3 (2009): 257-275.
- An influential paper arguing that in listening to music metaphor is “exploited in the perception, rather than being represented.”
Ridley, Aaron. Music, Value, and the Passions. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1995.
- Focuses on the melismatic gesture as a central component of musical expressiveness.
Robinson, Jenefer. Deeper than Reason: Emotion and its Role in Literature, Music, and Art. Oxford: Clarendon, 2005.
- Drawing on the author’s own theory of emotion, offers an account of musical expression and of the capacity for music to arouse emotions in the listener.
Sartre, Jean-Paul. The Psychology of Imagination. New York: Citadel, 1991.
- Sartre’s early account of music as presenting ideal beauty.
Sartre, Jean-Paul. Situations. Trans. Hazel E. Barnes. New York: George Braziller, 1965.
- Contains the essay, “The Artist and His Conscience,” which argues that music captures a historical milieu and additionally that music can be a transformational force used to further human freedom.
Schenker, Heinrich. Free Composition. Trans. and ed. Ernst Oster. New York: Longman,
- Classic treatise in musical analysis emphasizing the architectonic aspects of musical compositions.
Schopenhauer, Arthur. The World as Will and Representation. Trans. E.F.J. Payne. Indian Hills, Col.: Falcon’s Wing Press, 1958.
- Presents Schopenhauer’s philosophy of music as having the privileged status of being a direct presentation of the will, which is the thing-in-itself or underlying metaphysical reality.
Scruton, Roger. The Aesthetics of Music. New York: Oxford University Press, 1997.
- A thorough and insightful discussion of many of the major issues in musical aesthetics, including spaciality, ontology, expression, understanding, content, and both experiential and cultural value.
Scruton, Roger. “Musical Movement: A Reply to Budd.” British Journal of Aesthetics 44:2 (2004): 184–7.
- Argues for the indispensability of metaphor in the listening experience.
Serafine, Mary Louise. Music as Cognition: The Development of Thought in Sound. New York: Columbia University Press, 1988.
- Identifies twelve cognitive processes that are components of musical cognition and assesses experiments on people of different ages intended to shed light on how these processes develop.
Walton, Kendall. “What is Abstract about the Art of Music?” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 46:3 (1988): 351-364.
- Argues that music’s reference to extra-musical realities such as unnameable feelings and the dynamics of emotions, though imprecise, is important to explaining the power of music as an art form.
Zangwill, Nick. “Music, Metaphor, and Emotion.” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 65:4 (2007): 391–400.
- Argues against emotion theorists, claiming that what we experience in response to music is in some ways similar, but not equivalent to, actual emotion, and that instead of taking emotional descriptions of music literally, we should instead understand them as aesthetic metaphors.
Zuckerkandl, Victor. Sound and Symbol. Tr. Willard Trask. New York: Princeton University Press, 1956.
- An influential early study investigating our experience of tone, motion, time, and musical space.

Author Information

Michael Bazemore
Email: mbazemore01@gmail.com

U. S. A.

Ancient Ethics

Ethical reflection in ancient Greece and Rome starts from all of an agent’s ends or goals and tries to systematize them. Our ends are diverse. We typically want, among other things, material comfort, health, respect from peers and love from friends and family, successful children, healthy emotional lives, and intellectual achievement. We see all these things as good for us. So, systematizing our ends involves considering how various goods that we have or seek fit together. In particular, it involves thinking about what makes life good overall—what a happy human life consists in. In ancient ethical theory, then, the core question is: how can I live well? That is, how can I flourish and live a happy life? To a first approximation, happiness consists in having good things, but this formula must be read liberally. The most important goods in life may be activities or experiences, not things that one has in a quite narrow sense. If so, then happiness—having good things—centrally involves the relevant activities or experiences.

Rational reflection on these questions is not just an odd intellectual pursuit unconnected from living life well. Rather, the ancients agree that practical intelligence or wisdom—some sort of understanding of how our ends and goals fit together—is central to living well. We must grasp which ends subserve others (instrumentally or constitutively), which ends are important to our lives as a whole and which are not, and which ends we should reconceive, restrain, abandon altogether, or newly introduce because of how they fit (or fail to fit) with others. We can then guide our lives intelligently, better achieve our ends, and so live well and be happy. This ability to guide our lives intelligently is itself good for us. In fact, it can seem good in a different way from the other ends it governs. Other goods are bad in special circumstances and can be misused. For example, strength is bad when a tyrant conscripts the able-bodied to fight in an unjust war, and it can also be used to bully others. Practical intelligence is always good and cannot be misused; it is unconditionally good for the agent. Since happiness consists in having good things, in a suitably broad sense, and since practical intelligence is a preeminent good, living well centrally involves having and exercising practical intelligence.

This introduces another main feature of ancient ethics: it gives a central role to human excellence or virtue. Practical intelligence—a systematic, coherent grasp of all the goods in a life—is a virtue. Clearly, such a virtue, which amounts to expertise at living, plays a crucial role in living well (as expertise in any domain plays a crucial role in good performance in that domain). So this virtue, at least, is necessary for happiness. By reflecting on how practical intelligence connects to other virtues, we can see why ancient ethical theories say that virtue more generally is necessary, or even necessary and sufficient, for happiness.

Plato
Aristotle
Stoicism
Academic Skepticism
Epicureanism
Pyrrhonism
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Works
2. Secondary Works

1. Plato

Plato says that happiness is the possession, or the possession and correct use, of goods. Correlatively, misery is the possession of bads, or the possession and incorrect use of goods. If we ask why anyone does what she does, and reach the point of showing how her action fits into a happy life, we have fully explained and justified her action; no further question about why she wants to be happy and live well is apt. Put another way, we do everything for the sake of happiness, and we need nothing beyond happiness. Wisdom is both our highest good and the ability to use other goods well and beneficially. So, wisdom should be the first concern of anyone who wants to live well and be happy—that is, everyone. In particular, wisdom is more important than bodily and reputational goods such as health and honors. But as the condition that enables skillful activity in any domain is expertise in that domain, so too the state that enables skillful activity with goods is expertise concerning goods. So, wisdom—the highest human good—is knowledge of the good.

However, a problem lurks. If wisdom is the good for a human being, and the highest good for a human being is knowledge of the good, then wisdom seems to be knowledge of itself. This is unintelligible, and even if it were intelligible, it sounds useless. So, Plato introduces the form of the Good, distinct from other goods (including the highest human good) as the proper object of wisdom. The form of the Good is good without qualification—it is not merely the good of this or that sort of thing; it is what goodness is, in relation to which other goods are (qualifiedly) good. This gives a formal characterization of the Good; more substantively, the Good is unity. So, each thing is good when it is unified; civic unity is the highest good of a city, and psychological unity the highest good of a soul. That is, the soul achieves its highest good by putting its ends and attitudes into a coherent structure. This happens by coming to know the Good; when someone grasps that, she becomes like the object of her knowledge—the Good is unity, and knowing the Good unifies the soul. This identification of the Good with unity is one reason why Plato thinks that mathematics prepares the way for ethical knowledge.

That covers wisdom and its primary object, but what about other virtues? Plato sometimes says that all the virtues simply are wisdom—for example, that wisdom enables one to rule one’s pleasures and appetites (so that temperance is wisdom) and fears (so that courage is wisdom). On this view, there is only one virtue with several names. Elsewhere, he offers a somewhat weaker view: there are several virtues, but having one requires having them all. Even the weaker view provokes surprise; common sense says one can be, for example, just but not temperate, or wise but not courageous. Both versions of the claim that virtue is unified are grounded partly in the claim that affective states represent their objects as good or bad. For example, when someone fears heights on some occasion, she fears the harms of falling—fear represents something as bad for the subject. But wisdom systematically grasps what is really good and bad for us. So, the wise person never harbors any false belief about what is really good or bad for her. Hence, she fears things only to the extent that they really are bad for her—neither more nor less. That is, she is courageous, rather than cowardly or rash. Some things that the wise person knows are not bad may still appear bad to her, though, just as perceptual illusions persist even for those who do not trust in them.

Justice is a particularly important case; two of Plato’s longest works defend the claim that justice is unconditionally good for its possessor. The Gorgias says justice is organization, so a just soul is an organized soul; the Republic says justice is the condition in which each does its own work, so a just soul is one in which each part of the soul does its own work. As with the other virtues, justice is closely connected to wisdom. Again, wisdom is knowledge of the good; it is a systematic and coherent grasp of the relationships among all the goods one seeks. So, wisdom organizes the soul, and the wise person will be just. Because justice is so closely tied to wisdom, it is unsurprising that, like wisdom, it is unconditionally good for the agent. Thus, acting unjustly for the sake of mere conditional goods (for example, wealth or political power) is never prudent. For example, one cannot betray a friend and still have an organized soul; such actions reveal deep ignorance of what goods are most important and make life go well. Some scholars have worried that one could perhaps betray friends and still have an organized soul. Addressing this concern requires reflecting on whether loyalty to friends is actually more important than wealth. If it is, then someone with an organized soul will track this fact, and will never betray friends for the sake of wealth. And if having an organized soul is unconditionally good, then betraying friends for the sake of wealth is never prudent.

As we have seen, Plato thinks virtue is closely related to happiness. In particular, virtue is necessary for happiness—the vicious are not happy, but miserable. But we have not yet seen whether he thinks virtue suffices for happiness, or what else might conduce to happiness. Two important commitments in this regard—which Plato never explicitly thematizes, but regularly assumes—are that virtue and happiness (and vice and misery) come in degrees. Because virtue is the central determinant of happiness, it seems clear that as one becomes more virtuous, one becomes happier. One might take virtue to be the sole determinant of one’s degree of happiness. But in fact, Plato thinks that goods and bads other than virtue and vice—conditional goods such as wealth and honors—are relevant to how happy one is. These have opposite effects on the virtuous and vicious. Somebody with a certain degree of virtue, but with more conditional goods, is happier than somebody with the same degree of virtue but without those goods, or with correlative conditional bads. Somebody with a certain degree of vice, but with more conditional goods, is more miserable than somebody with the same degree of vice but without those goods, or with correlative conditional bads.

The reason for this is that conditional goods enable one to exercise one’s character more widely, while conditional bads prevent one from exercising one’s character as widely. Conditional goods thus allow a virtuous person to exercise her virtue more widely and a vicious person to exercise her vice more widely—they allow virtuous and vicious people to perform more virtuous and more vicious actions, making them happier and more miserable, respectively. Conditional bads keep virtuous and vicious people from performing actions that express their virtue or vice as fully, which makes them less happy and less miserable, respectively. Plato may think that these activities affect our happiness or misery directly, or he may think that their influence on our happiness is fully mediated by how they further shape our characters; he never commits himself one way or the other.

Plato thinks the highest human good is systematic knowledge of the Good (unity) together with the virtues identical to or entailed by that knowledge. Naturally, he rejects competing candidates for the highest human good, such as pleasure, love and friendship, and artistic achievement. In each case, he says how these other plausible candidates relate to his view.

The main alternative way of trying to unify our ends is hedonism, the view that the good—which we do everything for the sake of and which is all we need—is pleasure. Plato argues against hedonism in two main ways: (i) pleasure and pain occur together and cease together in the same place at the same time, as opposites like good and bad do not; (ii) pleasure is a process of restoration culminating in a good, harmonious condition, so pleasure cannot be the same as the good, harmonious condition it culminates in. These points are related: since pain is the felt disturbance of a good, harmonious condition, and pleasure the felt restoration to a good, harmonious condition, pleasure and pain (for example, pains of hunger and pleasures of eating) often occur together and cease together. This observation also allows Plato to argue that the virtuous live most pleasantly (although their pleasures do not make them happy). Because most bodily and reputational pleasures coincide with contrasting pains, they seem more intense than they are. (Compare how colors seem more intense against a contrasting background.) In fact, though, the pleasures associated with virtue and knowledge are larger than bodily and reputational pleasures—or so Plato argues.

Plato takes a similar line on love, friendship, and art: he denies that any of these provide the principles around which one can successfully organize one’s ends and live well, but he recognizes that they play important roles in such a life. When two people love each other and are friends, we can ask about the basis of their friendship. Any old relationship does not make life go well, and relationships directed at some objects can actually keep us from living well. So, we must say what love and friendship are for; Plato suggests that proper love and friendship are directed at the human good—at wisdom and virtue. But love and friendship are not just one way to seek wisdom and virtue. Plato always emphasizes the social character of philosophy (that is, love of wisdom). His approach to art is similar: the wrong kind corrupts us when young and tempts even good adults to hold vicious attitudes. However, the right kind of art is important to developing good character in childhood and to sustaining good character through an entire life.

One last topic deserves mention: Plato thinks that the soul is immortal and transmigrates. This is relevant to his ethics not because he thinks one should act differently in this life because the soul is immortal, but because it raises the stakes for decisions made in this life. Our choices have ramifications for our character in the afterlife and in our next life. So, Plato thinks about character development in the very long term—over many cycles of birth and death, covering many thousands of years.

2. Aristotle

Aristotle was Plato’s student, so we should not be surprised to see him developing similar ethical views. Still, there are differences of emphasis, points on which Aristotle is more explicit, and some points of clear disagreement between them.

Aristotle provides formal criteria for our final end—happiness—that closely resemble Plato’s. We do everything for the sake of happiness and do not seek it for the sake of anything further, and we need nothing beyond happiness. The best candidate for something of this sort, he argues, is a full life of excellent rational activity. Some readers think Aristotle has a compound theory of happiness: it is a full life of excellent rational activity, plus external goods such as health, wealth, good looks, and good children. However, Aristotle clearly distinguishes what happiness consists in from what it needs as background conditions, and he thinks happiness needs external goods as background conditions, not as constituents. There are two reasons for this. First, excellent rational activity requires some external goods as tools; second, lack of some external goods “spoils our blessedness.” One way to understand the latter claim is to notice that excellent rational activity must be unimpeded and pleasant; since everyone wants external goods, we need some not to be pained at their lack. Aristotle and Plato agree in thinking that the virtuous person lives a better life with more external goods, but Aristotle thinks that enough external bads hinder excellent rational activity. They make the virtuous person unable to exercise her virtues fully, either for lack of tools or because her activities are impeded by pain. Plato thinks rather that lack of external goods or presence of external bads cannot prevent the virtuous person from living well, but only that these can prevent her from living the happiest possible life.

Aristotle distinguishes two kinds of virtues that rational creatures can have and exercise: intellectual and character virtues. The highest intellectual virtue is wisdom (sophia), which combines a grasp of the world’s highest principles (nous) and ability to reason deductively from them (epistêmê). The first principle of the world is the source of change that does not itself change—often called the “unmoved mover,” or God. Aristotle calls God the highest good, with which he proposes to replace Plato’s form of the Good. Plato distinguishes the form of the Good from any thinkers or thoughts about goodness, and identifies God with intelligence. But Aristotle says God is both thinker and object of thought. Plato’s God is personal; Aristotle’s is impersonal and does not think about the things it changes. God changes other things not by deliberating and acting, but by being what changing things strive to be like, to the extent possible. For example, the stars change in the smallest way possible for things that change: by circular motion. A life spent in exercising the highest intellectual virtues, to the extent possible, is the best life, and a life most like God’s. A life spent in exercising character virtues is also happy, but we exercise character virtues in part to make contemplation possible, while we contemplate just for its own sake. Thus, exercise of the character virtues fits the constraints on our final end less well than exercise of the highest intellectual virtues.

One intellectual virtue, practical wisdom (phronêsis), has a special relationship to character virtue; nobody can have any character virtue without practical wisdom, and nobody can have practical wisdom without all the central character virtues. Thus, Aristotle subscribes to a version of the unity of virtue. Practical wisdom and the character virtues shape and govern the parts of the human being that are non-rational but susceptible to reason (which are concerned with the material and social conditions of human life). One can exercise the character virtues in private life only or also in public life; the latter involves exercising them more widely, so it is preferable and more godlike. Thus, Aristotle addresses his discussion of character virtue to those who intend to enter politics. This is related to an odd feature of Aristotle’s account of justice: because each character virtue can be exercised in relation to others, he identifies “general justice” with the entirety of virtue. Again, practical wisdom and the character virtues can be exercised privately or politically, but achieve their fullest expression politically. The virtue concerned with other people is justice, so there is a sense in which justice encompasses all of character virtue and a correlative sense in which political expertise is simply practical wisdom writ large.

Aristotle describes each character virtue as being (and hitting) a “mean” in both action and feeling. Hitting the mean in action and feeling involves doing the right thing and feeling the right thing, at the right time, in the right ways, in relation to the right people. (Hitting the mean need not involve doing or feeling a moderate amount; it can be right to perform a grand action or to refrain from acting entirely, and it can be right to feel intensely or not to feel at all.) Each virtue is a mean by falling between two vices—wit, for example, is a mean that falls between buffoonery and boorishness.

The ability to figure out what to do can come apart from feeling the right way about one’s situation. (For example, one might see that one should confront a sexist comment, but be more afraid of doing so than one should be.) In such cases, one can either do the right thing despite one’s feelings, or act on one’s feelings contrary to one’s considered judgment. In the former case, the action is continent (but not virtuous); in the latter case, the action is incontinent (but not vicious). So, continence and incontinence are states of character between virtue and vice. Aristotle also sketches a character worse than vice, “brutishness,” and a character superior to virtue, which is godlike.

The ideal of being like God returns us to an important tension in Aristotle’s treatment of external goods. Usually, Aristotle thinks that lack of external goods can ruin the happiness of a virtuous person by impeding her exercise of virtue, and possession of external goods enables the wider exercise of virtue. He even introduces special virtues concerned with great wealth (magnificence) and great honor (magnanimity). Elsewhere, though, he argues that the contemplative life is superior to the political life in part because it needs fewer external goods, and he posits a godlike state that transcends virtue in its detachment from ordinary human concerns like health and wealth. This problem also arises in the case of friends. Friendship in the core sense involves seeking to become virtuous and acting well together. But the virtuous are self-sufficient, and the self-sufficient need friends least; so, the virtuous need friends least. In particular, the more godlike someone becomes, the less she needs friends at all. Aristotle has ways of trying to address this problem: he says that the virtuous need friends so that they have someone to benefit, and in order to best enjoy activities that are their own (since a friend is a “second self”). However, these two strands of Aristotle—one stressing the need for external goods and friends, the other stressing the need for independence from external goods and friends—remain in tension.

3. Stoicism

Stoicism comprises a centuries-long tradition, involving considerable disagreement among its adherents. This article focuses mainly on early Stoicism as articulated by its first three scholarchs: Zeno, Cleanthes, and especially Chrysippus. Some of the claims called “Stoic” here are rejected by other, later Stoics such as Panaetius and Posidonius. Some are rejected by an important early Stoic, Aristo, who lost a struggle to define the movement and so was retroactively deemed heterodox. There are disagreements among the earliest scholarchs as well, only a few of which are tracked here.

“Nature” plays a significant role in Plato and Aristotle’s ethics, especially in the contrast between nature and convention. But nature as a central organizing principle in ethical theory takes off in the Hellenistic period. For the Stoics, this emerges in their formula for the final end, “living in accordance with nature.” Cleanthes understands “nature” here as cosmic nature, while Chrysippus understands both cosmic and human nature.

One key appeal to human nature comes in the form of a “cradle argument,” which uses the behavior of unsocialized babies to establish what is natural and not merely conventional. The Stoics say that a newborn first finds herself and her constitution congenial (oikeion). So, she has an impulse to preserve herself and her constitution. Thus, the newborn finds whatever preserves herself and her constitution congenial, and has an impulse toward them; she finds whatever destroys herself and her constitution uncongenial, and has an impulse away from them. Our constitution includes bodily, psychological, and social abilities. At first, these are unsophisticated; the baby can flail her limbs, perceive her surroundings, and demand food from her caretakers. All these capacities are natural to her, congenial to her, and she has an impulse to exercise and preserve them. In short, the uncorrupted baby, her capacities, the exercise of those capacities, and whatever conduces to the preservation and exercise of herself and her capacities, have value for her. The opposites all have disvalue.

Next, the Stoics sketch the development of more bodily, psychological, and social abilities. We can stand, walk, and run; we can distance ourselves from appearances and assess whether things are as they seem; and we can engage in reciprocal relationships with others. These developments are natural to us. We continue to find ourselves and our developing constitutions congenial and have an impulse to exercise and preserve ourselves and our constitutions. Again, all these things have value for us and the opposites have disvalue.

Some key psychological aspects of our constitution are the capacity to receive impressions (for things to seem a certain way); the capacity to assent to impressions and so form beliefs, or else to withhold assent; the capacity to receive “graspable impressions” (true impressions that could not possibly be false); and the ability to distinguish graspable from non-graspable impressions, and assent to the former but not the latter. Assent to a graspable impression produces a grasp (katalêpsis), which constitutes an infallible awareness of a small part of reality. Grasps are the Stoic “criterion of truth”—the proper touchstone for any inquiry or argument—but they do not amount to knowledge. Knowledge requires stability, even in the face of dialectical examination (as it did for Plato). That requires assenting only to graspable impressions and organizing one’s grasps into a stable explanatory structure. This sets a high bar for knowledge (and for virtue, which, as we shall see, the Stoics identify with knowledge). Few humans, if any, ever attain knowledge. Still, grasps are a stepping stone; both the wise and the foolish have them, and they offer a path from foolishness to wisdom. Even though few of us make it, wisdom is the natural end point of human development.

This brings us back to value, which is distinct from goodness. Only what always benefits is good, just as only what always makes things hot is heat. That is, goodness is unconditional value. Most valuable things lack unconditional value (are not good) for familiar reasons: in special circumstances, things that are ordinarily valuable are disvaluable, and most valuable things can be misused. So, the Stoics call conditionally valuable things preferred indifferents, which should be selected; conditionally disvaluable things are dispreferred indifferents, which should be rejected. Things of no value or disvalue, or very little, are strictly indifferent and should be neither selected nor rejected. Only good and bad things should be chosen and avoided; these unconditional impulses are only fittingly directed at good and bad objects.

This introduces a crucial concept: appropriate actions (kathêkonta), or actions that admit of a reasonable defense. Importantly, the agent need not be able to provide such a defense to perform an appropriate action. (Even non-rational animals have and can perform their own appropriate actions.) As the wise and foolish both have grasps, so both the virtuous and vicious can perform appropriate actions. However, only the wise person can defend her grasps and her actions in the face of all questioning. Since the wise person (also called the sage) does appropriate actions for the right reasons, the Stoics call her actions right actions (katorthômata). The sage’s rational defense of her actions appeals to the value and disvalue of the preferred and dispreferred indifferents at stake, and explains how her selections and rejections respond appropriately to that value and disvalue. There are no action-types (aside from virtuous actions) that the sage always performs; occasionally, even cannibalism and incest are appropriate actions.

If the sage appeals to the value and disvalue of indifferents to explain her actions, where do virtue and the good enter the picture? Start from the developing agent who not only reacts immediately to particular valuable and disvaluable things, but who can compare value and disvalue and sometimes, at least, find the appropriate action. The next step in proper development is to perform appropriate actions regularly and reliably. Eventually, the agent appreciates how appropriate actions fit together into an orderly, harmonious life. At this point, the developing agent comes to see that the order and harmony of her life—made possible by reasoning about value and disvalue—has a value different in kind from the value of the things she reasons about. That order and harmony is, in a word, good.

The primary good thing in Stoicism is virtue, or practical intelligence about comparative selection-value. (Other goods include virtuous activity, the virtuous agent, and a friend—only the good are friends, because only they harmonize with themselves and each other.) The virtuous person appreciates the relevant values at stake in her circumstances and has a stable, coherent view about how to compare the values at stake. (She also knows that she acts with imperfect information, so she acts “with reservation”—in the knowledge that new information may require a change of plans or attitudes.) Unlike preferred and dispreferred indifferents, one would always rather have virtue so understood, and it cannot be misused. That is, virtue has unconditional value—it is good. The sage selects and rejects indifferents constantly and firmly and so has the “smooth flow of life” that the Stoics call happiness.

Since happiness is the possession (or possession and correct use) of goods, and since the Stoics think virtue is the only good and cannot be misused, the virtuous person is happy. The sage’s happiness does not depend upon whether she actually acquires preferred indifferents and not dispreferred indifferents; that is why they are indifferent (with respect to happiness). Virtue is perfect psychological coherence, which does not come in degrees, so neither does happiness. Thus, the sage is fully happy even on the rack (because she has and exercises virtue) and she always acts virtuously. Cicero illustrates this point with the example of Regulus, a Roman general who was captured by the Carthaginians. Regulus promised that he would carry terms of surrender back to Rome and then return. When he arrived in Rome, he argued against accepting the terms, returned to Carthage as promised, and was tortured and killed there. (Notice that this counts as an appropriate action only if keeping a promise to the enemy and its effects had greater selection-value than Regulus’ physical comfort and continued life and their effects. One cannot assume that Regulus’ behavior is required by justice, because the Stoics deny such general claims as “one should always keep promises,” “one should never have sex with close relatives,” and “one should never consume human flesh.”) On the flip side, everyone who is not a sage is foolish (because we all lack perfect psychological coherence) and miserable (because we all have the only bad thing, vice). All non-sages are equally vicious and miserable, even those who are making progress (prokopê), much as those who are underwater but rising toward the surface are drowning no less than those who are not rising toward the surface.

We are now in a position to understand the view most often associated with Stoic ethics: advocacy of freedom from passions (apatheia). This does not mean that we should have no affective life at all. The Stoics have a technical definition of passions (pathê) as fresh, weak judgments that something is good or bad. (A judgment is fresh when it is newly assented to; a judgment is weak when it is unstable and so not known, even if it is true.) The four highest species of passion are pleasure, pain, desire, and fear. Pleasure and desire represent their objects as good in the present and future, respectively, while pain and fear represent their objects as bad in the present and future. The sage has good versions of three of these four: joy (reasonable elation), wish (reasonable choice), and caution (reasonable avoidance). They omit any good version of pain, which suggests that the “good feelings” (eupatheiai) are strong, known judgments about what is good and bad, and are never directed at preferred and dispreferred indifferents. The sage, being wise, will never judge that anything that is neither good nor bad—for example, any preferred or dispreferred indifferent—is either good or bad. Further, the sage never is bad, but may become bad again. So, she is fittingly cautious about future bads, but she will never experience a negative affect directed at her present badness. For as long as she is wise, she is virtuous, good, and happy, not vicious, bad, and miserable.

So far we have focused on human nature, but we saw above that Cleanthes and Chrysippus both think our end involves living in accordance with cosmic nature. Accordingly, physics (knowledge of nature in general) is a virtue. But how more specifically does knowledge of the cosmos connect to ethics? In at least two ways. First, the Stoics are pantheists—the study of nature reveals that it is providentially ordered, and indeed that the cosmos simply is God. God’s beneficial arrangement of the cosmos (that is, of God’s body) requires that God be good and virtuous. Given the paucity of human sages, physics is the study of the only virtuous, good thing we know. Second, the Stoics use the providential governance of the cosmos and our role as parts of it to argue for ethical conclusions—especially that we should value the common interest more than our own. Chrysippus uses a striking image: suppose our feet were rational. The rational foot would understand itself as part of a larger rational organism, and conduct itself accordingly. For example, given its understanding of what is valuable for the whole of which it is a part, the foot would sometimes want to be muddied. The foot might even desire to be amputated if amputation were the only way for the whole rational animal to carry on in the best way. But each human being is in fact a rational part of a rational whole, the cosmos. So, given our understanding of what is valuable for the cosmos as a whole, we should sometimes want to have dispreferred indifferents, and even sometimes to die, so that the whole cosmos can carry on in the best way.

4. Academic Skepticism

The Academics take their name from Plato’s Academy. Arcesilaus was a head of the Academy who took the school back to (what he thought were) its skeptical roots. Here he could appeal to Plato’s Socrates, who denied knowing anything important and tried to show others that they were in the same position. He could also appeal to Plato, who can be seen as distancing himself from any dogmatic views by writing dialogues, many of which end in puzzlement anyway. The Academics would argue on both sides of any question; in one famous case, Carneades—the greatest of the Academics—went to Rome and argued for justice on one day and against justice on the next. A favorite Academic target was the Stoic claim that cognitive impressions exist and can be distinguished from non-cognitive ones; debates between Academics and Stoics persisted for quite a long time.

Like other global skeptics, Academics must explain how they can maintain their skepticism without walking off cliffs. They say that they do and maybe even believe what is reasonable or plausible. Plausibility comes in degrees, and Carneades suggests three important grades: initially plausible impressions, uncontroverted impressions (which are not only plausible but also agree with related plausible impressions), and thoroughly tested impressions (which require examining each of the related plausible impressions that agrees with an uncontroverted impression). One can rely on different grades of plausibility depending on the matter at hand. To jump away from something on the ground that may be a poisonous snake, the Academic only needs a plausible impression; to decide how to live, she will want thoroughly tested impressions.

In the Academic–Stoic debate, both sides made accommodations under dialectical pressure. Eventually, one Academic, Antiochus of Ascalon, rejected skepticism and accepted views close to Stoicism in both epistemology and ethics. (Cicero, another late Academic who held more firmly to skepticism, did something similar; his De Officiis rehearses and then supplements the Stoic Panaetius’ work on appropriate actions.) Antiochus claims to be recovering an ancient consensus among Plato, Aristotle, and the Stoics. In ethics, this putative consensus says that virtue suffices for happiness, but possession of external and bodily goods makes the happy person happier, while their lack makes her less happy. The Stoics (says Antiochus) just use new and misleading language to state this consensus view. Antiochus’ “consensus view” lies quite close to Plato’s (as described above), but he papers over differences among his view, Aristotle’s view, and the Stoics’ view on the role of bodily and external goods in happiness. Antiochus’ view of Aristotle is understandable, though, especially since the Aristotelians of his day did hold the view that he attributes to Aristotle.

5. Epicureanism

The views canvassed above all accept that living well consists in virtue or virtuous activity. (Though the Academics are skeptics, they reliably seem to find this sort of view more plausible than the alternatives.) Another kind of ancient ethical theory says that living well consists in pleasure; the most important such view is Epicureanism.

Although they are outliers in other ways, the Epicureans operate from standard constraints on our final end: we do everything else for its sake, and we do not seek it for the sake of anything else. They use several approaches to defend their claim that the final end of all our actions is pleasure. First, they say that pleasure’s goodness is evident in perception and need only be pointed out, not argued for—much as we need not argue that fire is hot, since its heat is evident in perception. Second, like the Stoics, the Epicureans offer a version of the cradle argument. Where the Stoics say that the newborn’s first, uncorrupted impulse is for the exercise and preservation of herself and her constitution, the Epicureans say that she goes for pleasure. Finally, some Epicureans responded to arguments against hedonism. Sadly, no direct replies to the best anti-hedonist arguments of antiquity survive, but we do have some attempts to explain why many people deny the obvious truth of hedonism.

In one way, bodily pleasures and pains have a special role in the Epicurean view: all other pleasures and pains must be “referred to” them, directly or indirectly. For example, worry about losing one’s job might be referred directly to pains of hunger and physical exposure (because the job pays for food and shelter). Worry about what the boss thinks might be referred to worry about losing one’s job, and indirectly to the same bodily pains. This can be repeated indefinitely; perhaps one’s worry about proper clothing is referred to what the boss thinks, and so on. The key claim is that all psychological pleasures and pains must ultimately be referred back to the body. Plato and others, in contrast, say that we have basic non-bodily pleasures and pains—for example, shame at one’s bad reputation, or pleasure when one learns something new, just by themselves.

In another way, though, psychological pleasures and pains have a special role: they have greater magnitude than bodily pleasures and pains. On this point, the Epicureans actually agree with Plato and others above. However, they explain the comparative magnitudes in a different way: the body only registers what is happening right now, while the soul ranges over past, present, and future. The soul thus represents to itself a much larger array of pleasures and pains, and can feel more pleasure and pain than the body can at a moment. (Here the Epicureans disagree with their hedonist predecessors, the Cyrenaics, who say that bodily pain is used as punishment because its magnitude is greater than pain of the soul.)

The other most important Epicurean thesis about pleasure and pain is their denial that there is any neutral hedonic state in which one experiences neither pleasure nor pain. (On this point, they disagree with both Plato and the Cyrenaics.) If there is no neutral hedonic state, then complete removal of pain obviously cannot culminate in the neutral state; the condition in which one is completely free of pain must be pleasure. In fact, once pain is removed, they say, pleasure cannot be intensified, in either the body or the soul. Because psychological pleasures are greater than bodily pleasures, freedom from disturbance of the soul (ataraxia) is the key determinant of happiness, more important than freedom from bodily pain (aponia). Thus, any bodily pain can be outweighed by the pleasure of freedom from disturbance, and the Epicurean sage can live well in any external circumstances, even on the rack. Ataraxia (sometimes translated “tranquility”) requires three main subsidiary achievements: freedom from fear of death, freedom from fear of the gods, and freedom from excessive desire.

Epicurean arguments that death is not fearful continue to attract a great deal of attention from contemporary philosophers. The Epicureans argue that death is the end for us; we are not immortal. Then—and this is where contemporary discussion usually begins—being destroyed cannot harm us, for two reasons. First, when we are dead, we perceive nothing, and only what we perceive can harm us. (Some people object: things we do not perceive can harm us, as when a friend betrays us but we never find out.) Second, when we exist, we are not yet dead, so death cannot harm us while we are alive. Once we are dead, we no longer exist, so death cannot harm us when we are dead either. The second argument can be developed in various ways. The Epicurean poet Lucretius asks whether we were harmed by our pre-natal non-existence, and argues that if we were not, then our post-mortem non-existence also will not harm us. (Some people object: we can be harmed when we do not exist, as when a project that we care about and work hard to support fails after our death. Nothing pre-natal could harm us in this way.) One important clarification: as we shall see, the Epicureans think it is (usually) natural to try to avoid death. However, trying to avoid death does not entail fearing it, any more than we must fear getting our shoes wet in order to avoid getting our shoes wet.

The Epicureans try to remove fear of the gods by appealing to the concept of divinity: gods are immortal and blessed. But perfectly blessed gods can neither be benefited nor harmed by others (including human beings). So, they will never be grateful to human beings for benefiting them or angry at human beings for harming them. Therefore, the phenomena popularly ascribed to divine agency—for example, thunderbolts, seen as expressions of divine anger—cannot be explained that way. To vindicate this claim, they offer scientific accounts of the world solely in terms of the basic principles of atoms and void.

Finally, the Epicureans divide desires: some are natural and others are not. The former are grounded in actual human needs; the latter (for example, the desire to have statues erected in one’s honor) are not. Among the natural desires, some are necessary and others are not. Unnecessary natural desires are grounded in actual human needs (they are natural), but they aim to meet that need in a particular way, even though it could be met in many other ways. For example, caviar can meet the human need for food, so desire for caviar is natural. But our need for food can be met in many ways, so the desire for caviar is not a necessary desire. Natural and necessary desires are for the proper objects of genuine human needs. There are three kinds of natural and necessary desires, depending on what they are necessary for: happiness, freedom from bodily pain, and life. This division is fairly clear: we need some things to stay alive, and desires for those things are natural and necessary. But we could be alive and in severe bodily pain, which is naturally bad for us. So, desires for what we need to remove bodily pain are also necessary—for example, food and drink in general (but not caviar and champagne specifically). Further, we can be alive and free from bodily pain but still miserable, because our minds are troubled. Thus, we also have natural and necessary desires for what can remove mental trouble: virtue and friendship.

Several virtues can be treated fairly quickly. Courage is the state in which one is free from irrational fear of death and the gods (which also requires piety). Temperance is the state in which one has natural desires and abandons unnecessary desires whenever circumstances make it difficult to eat (say) caviar instead of barley. Wisdom is knowledge of death, the gods, desires and pleasures, and the basic structure of the cosmos; it instills piety, courage, and temperance. That leaves the most interesting virtue for the Epicureans, justice, which has both social and personal aspects. Socially, justice is a useful agreement—in particular, an agreement to neither harm nor be harmed. For an agreement to be just, it must actually be useful. Which agreements are useful (and so just) varies, so different agreements are just in different circumstances. Still, the core concept of justice as a useful agreement does not change. Next, there are two accounts of why personal justice is important. First, even if one can get away with violating just social agreements, one cannot be sure that one will get away with it. So, violating just social agreements causes fear. Fear is a psychological pain; since such pains are greater than bodily pains, whatever material goods one hopes to gain by violating a just social agreement cannot compensate for injustice’s cost in fear. Second, whatever one might hope to gain through injustice will not be necessary for life, health, or tranquility. Since the sage is temperate, she desires only what is necessary to life, health, and tranquility. Such limited goods are (usually) easily obtained. So, the sage has no incentive to violate just social agreements. Whenever extreme circumstances might seem to give an incentive, we should reconsider whether the original agreements are genuinely useful in those extreme circumstances, and so whether the agreements are still just.

Lastly, Epicurus praises friendship for its ability to make us tranquil. It is tricky to say how friendship and justice differ. Epicurus says justice is an agreement neither to harm nor be harmed, which suggests a possibility: justice seeks mutual avoidance of harm—not only by not harming one another, but also by assisting each other in not being harmed. Friendship goes beyond that; it requires mutual benefit. But what kind of benefits? Friends help each other when necessary, and Epicurus agrees that this is one benefit of friendship. But more important for our tranquility is our confidence that we will have help from our friends in the future, if we need it. This includes not only help with mundane tasks like moving, or momentous ones like providing for one’s children after one dies; the Epicureans actually formed a sort of commune near Athens, and dedicated their days to philosophical therapy through an elaborate set of confessional practices. Thus, friends help each other to achieve the highest good (tranquility) by helping each other to achieve its necessary means (virtue).

6. Pyrrhonism

Pyrrho himself is a nebulous figure, but in the wake of the Academy’s later skeptical turn (see above), Aenesidemus revived his legacy by using him as a figurehead for a different skeptical tradition. The differences between Academics and Pyrrhonists are not always easy to discern. Our main source for Pyrrhonism, Sextus Empiricus, says there are three kinds of philosophers: dogmatists (who claim to have grasped the truth), Academics (who say the truth cannot be grasped), and Pyrrhonists (who are still inquiring). Thus, Sextus effectively characterizes Academics as dogmatists who claim to have grasped one truth. However, his classification does not withstand scrutiny. The Academics follow persuasive appearances, and any claim that the truth cannot be discovered may be understood as what is plausible after extensive inquiry (not: what they claim to grasp as the truth). As we shall see, the Academics use of persuasive appearances is not far from what the Pyrrhonists say and do.

Still, there is a clear difference in the ethical attitudes taken by Academics and Pyrrhonists. The Academics typically say that something like the Aristotelian or Stoic view—that virtue and virtuous activity are the highest or only goods—is plausible. The Pyrrhonists say that their end is tranquility (again, ataraxia). This places their ethical attitude closer to the Epicureans, though their recipe for tranquility is rather different. (Here it is worth noting that later Roman Stoics also emphasized tranquility in a way that the early Stoics did not.)

We must work up to that point by considering the development of a young Pyrrhonist. First, she notices that different appearances often make incompatible reports. (The wind seems warm to her and cold to another; cremating the dead seems respectful to her and disrespectful to another.) Aenesidemus listed many ways that appearances can disagree, the “Aenesideman modes.” Such disagreement or relativity of appearances is puzzling: which appearances reflect how things really are? On topics that we care about, such puzzlement is painful and provokes attempts to remove it by vindicating some appearances over others. That is, puzzlement provokes inquiry into how things really are in themselves, as opposed to how they appear to various subjects.

When the Pyrrhonist inquires, though, she discovers equally strong reasons on both sides of every question. Further, whatever considerations she might appeal to in trying to resolve the dispute are also matters of disagreement, requiring more inquiry, and so on. The state in which one finds equally strong reasons on both sides of an issue is “equipollence”; the Pyrrhonist responds to equipollence by suspending judgment on which appearances reflect how things really are. When she does so, the pain that she felt at being puzzled dissolves. Sextus offers a simile: Apelles was trying and failing to paint the froth on a horse’s mouth. In frustration, he threw his sponge at the canvas; fortuitously, it produced the desired effect. Likewise, the budding Pyrrhonist wants to rid herself of troubles about the real nature of things by discovering the truth. She never finds reasons for any particular view better than the reasons on the other side. So, she suspends judgment. But when she does, she fortuitously achieves the end she sought: tranquility. As mentioned above, though, she does not rest on her laurels at this point; rather, she keeps inquiring.

Like Academics, Pyrrhonists must explain how they act. The Pyrrhonist criterion of action is the appearance. We can approach this through the examples of relativity above. When the wind seems warm to one person and cool to another, and they have equally strong reasons to trust each appearance, they might suspend judgment on the question whether the wind is really warm or cool. But this does not remove the appearances; the wind still seems cool to one and warm to the other. It also does not prevent either from acting on her appearance. One might put on another layer of clothing, while the other takes one off. Likewise when two people disagree whether it is respectful to cremate the dead. We might find equally good reasons to say that cremation is respectful and that it is disrespectful. But it may still seem respectful to one person and disrespectful to the other, and nothing prevents each person from acting on how things seem to them. (It is an open question whether this will produce toleration of different opinions or simply make practical disputes irresolvable.) It is unclear exactly how much the Pyrrhonist criterion of action, the appearance, differs from the Academic criterion, the plausible appearance. For example, both Pyrrhonists and Academics follow their traditional religious practices, which suggests some convergence in how ancient skeptics of different stripes deal with action.

Again, their clearest difference concerns the final end. Naturally, the Pyrrhonists do not dogmatically assert that tranquility is the end; it simply seems to them to be the end, and they act based on that appearance. But they say more about why Pyrrhonism seems to be the best path to tranquility—better than Epicureanism, for example. Certain appearances and feelings are unavoidable for us: hunger seems painful and leads us to relieve it. There is no getting rid of these appearances and feelings. However, those who dogmatically assert that pain is bad (for example) face a double dose of pain. They feel not only the inevitable pain of hunger, but also the further pain of mental trouble on reflecting that they possess something that is (by their lights) really bad for them. The Pyrrhonist, however, suspends judgment on the question whether the pains of hunger are really bad for her. Thus, she maintains her tranquility even in the face of life’s inevitable nuisances.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

J. Annas and R. Woolf, Cicero: On Moral Ends (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).
- Cicero presents the ethical views of the Epicureans, Stoics, and Antiochus, and disputes them with reference to Carneades’ division of ethical theories.
C. Brittain, Cicero: On Academic Scepticism (Indianapolis: Hackett Press, 2006).
- Our main source of information about the Stoic–Academic debate and the development of the Skeptical Academy.
J. Cooper, Plato: Complete Works (Indianapolis: Hackett Press, 1997).
R. Crisp, Aristotle: Nicomachean Ethics (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000).
M. Griffin and E. Atkins, Cicero: On Duties (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991).
- Cicero adapts and extends Panaetius’ work on appropriate actions.
B. Inwood and L. Gerson, Hellenistic Philosophy (Indianapolis: Hackett Press, 1998).
- An excellent source book.
A. Long and D. Sedley, The Hellenistic Philosophers (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1987).
- Another excellent source book; v.1 contains translations, while v.2 contains the texts translated (and sometimes more) together with a substantial bibliography.

b. Secondary Works

K. Algra, et al., The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000).
- A series of essays by various authors on central topics, and contains an extensive bibliography.
J. Annas, An Introduction to Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1981).
J. Annas, The Morality of Happiness (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1993).
- Influential overview of the ethical theories of Aristotle and the main Hellenistic schools.
J. Annas, Platonic Ethics, Old and New (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000).
- Argues for a Stoicized interpretation of Plato’s ethics by reference to Middle Platonist readings of Plato.
J. Barnes, The Toils of Skepticism (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1990).
T. Brennan, The Stoic Life (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2005).
S. Broadie, Ethics with Aristotle (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991).
G. Fine, Plato 2: Ethics, Politics, Religion, and the Soul (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999).
- A collection of essays, including many classics.
T. Irwin, Plato’s Ethics (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995).
R. Kraut, Aristotle on the Human Good (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1989).
P. Mitsis, Epicurus’ Ethical Theory (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989).
M. Nussbaum, The Fragility of Goodness (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1986).
- A study of moral luck in Greek tragedy, Plato, and Aristotle.
M. Nussbaum, The Therapy of Desire (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1994).
- Essays on ethical theory and therapy in Aristotle and Hellenistic philosophy.
T. O’Keefe, Epicureanism (Berkeley: University of California Press, 2009).
G. Lear, Happy Lives and the Highest Good (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004).
- A study of the relationship between ethical and theoretical virtues in Aristotle.
A. Rorty, Essays on Aristotle’s Ethics (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1980).
- A collection of essays, including many classics.
H. Thorsrud, Ancient Skepticism (Berkeley: University of California Press, 2008).

Author Information

Clerk Shaw
Email: jshaw15@utk.edu
University of Tennessee
U. S. A.

Zhou Dunyi (Chou Tun-i, 1017-1073)

Zhou Dunyi (sometimes romanized as Chou Tun-i and also known by his posthumous name, Zhou Lianxi) has long been highly esteemed by Chinese thinkers. He is considered one of the first “Neo-Confucians,” a group of thinkers who draw heavily on Buddhist and Daoist metaphysics to articulate a comprehensive, Confucian religious philosophy.

This article begins with a brief look at Zhou’s life and historical context before turning to a detailed examination of his major writings. It then looks at major themes in Zhou’s work as well as a few important philosophical concerns that his writings address. Finally, it turns to Zhou’s legacy and influence, providing information on additional readings for further study of Zhou’s thought.

Zhou combines deep spirituality with an emphasis on morality and politics. He places this humanistic ideal within a cosmic vision wherein the forces of creation find their fullest expression in human beings. Essentially, he articulates the common metaphysical framework that informed Chinese philosophy for nearly a millennium. In his work, Zhou follows earlier thinkers such as Mencius (Mengzi, 372-289 B.C.E.), but, unlike some of his stricter Confucian brethren, Zhou draws heavily on ideas associated with Daoism and Buddhism. This is particularly the case with Zhou’s stress on the primacy of “stillness” (qing) over “activity” (dong) and his strong cosmological orientation. Moreover, Zhou’s temperament seems marked more by Buddhist notions of equanimity and compassion than stereotypical Confucian formality and restraint. For these reasons, Zhou remains an intriguing yet controversial figure.

According to Zhu Xi (1130-1200), perhaps the most eminent early Neo-Confucian thinker, Zhou was the first sage since Mencius and a key figure in the “new transmission” of the Confucian Way (Dao). Zhou transmitted the Way to the Cheng brothers, Cheng Hao (1032-1085) and Cheng Yi (1033-1107), who then transmitted the Way to Zhu himself. In this view, Zhou is the “founding ancestor” of Zhu Xi’s school of Neo-Confucianism, a philosophical system that profoundly informed East Asian societies in the Middle Ages. Zhou’s best known works are the “Explanation of the Diagram of the Supreme Polarity” (Taijitu shuo), and Penetrating the Classic of Changes (Tongshu), both of which are included in the Zhouzi Quanshu (Collected Works of Master Zhou). Zhou also wrote a short poetic essay, “On the Love of the Lotus” (Ai lian shuo), that is part of the standard secondary school curriculum in contemporary Taiwan.

Life and Context
Works
Key Concepts
Principal Concerns
Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Context

Much of what we know of Zhou’s life comes from the Song Shi (History of the Song Dynasty), as well as anecdotes preserved in Reflections on Things at Hand (Jinsi lu), the anthology of Song-era Confucian treatises compiled by Zhu Xi with the help of the historian Lü Zuqian (1137-1181). Totaling some 622 passages culled from the writings of key thinkers (along with Zhu Xi’s comments), this book ranks as one of the most important works of Chinese philosophy.

Zhou was born in Daozhou (modern-day Hunan) into a family of scholar-officials. His “style name” was “Maoshu.” Originally, his personal name was “Dunshi,” but due to the taboo against using the name of the emperor (a widely observed practice in traditional China), Zhou’s name was changed to “Dunyi” when Emperor Yingzong ascended to the throne in 1063. When Zhou was 14 years old, his father passed away but he was adopted by his maternal uncle, Zheng Xiang. It was through his uncle’s work that Zhou attained his first governmental post. During his career, Zhou served as district keeper of records, magistrate of various counties, and assistant prefect. Traditional accounts say that he was quite diligent in his duties, earning high praise from his colleagues and superiors; yet Zhou refused to participate in the civil service examination system, the typical route by which bright and capable men gained access to the elite levels of Song society. As a result, Zhou never held a high governmental position nor attained the coveted “presented scholar” (jinshi) degree, the highest rank and a virtual necessity for attaining an influential post.

Towards the end of his life, Zhou fell ill and was transferred to Xingzi in Jiangxi province, where he settled near the foot of Mount Lu, one of China’s sacred mountains. Here he built a retreat along a tributary of the Pen River, naming it Lianxi (“Stream of Waterfalls”) after a stream in his home village; later generations honored Zhou by calling him “Master Lianxi” after his beloved study. Zhou resigned from office in 1071, passing away about eighteen months later. During his lifetime, Zhou was not well known, even though he briefly tutored both Cheng Hao (1032-1085) and Cheng Yi (1033-1107) when they were young. His contemporaries, however, revered him for his warm personality and intuitive insight into the Way of Heaven. Later Neo-Confucians came to regard him as an exemplar of “authenticity” (cheng), much like Confucius’ disciple Yan Hui. In 1200, Zhou was posthumously dubbed Yuangong (“Duke of Yuan”) and in 1241 was honored in the sacrifices performed in the official Confucian temple.

Zhou lived during the Northern Song (960-1126), the “second golden age” of Confucianism. The initial impetus for this Confucian renaissance came from late Tang Confucian thinkers such as Han Yu (768-824), Li Ao (772-836), and Liu Zhongyuan (773-819). They were highly critical of Buddhism and advocated for a return to what they considered the true source of Chinese civilization (in Zhu Xi’s words, “this culture of ours”), a heritage enshrined in the Classical Confucian texts. After the collapse of the Tang and the eventual rise of the Song dynasty, Confucianism became the guiding Way and, just as in the Han dynasty (206 B.C.E.-220 C.E.), anyone seeking an official position had to be schooled in Confucian texts and doctrines.

The Confucian revival in the early Song was by no means monolithic, however, and several prominent thinkers also pursued studies outside of official circles. While looking to Confucian ideas, many of these thinkers investigated and embraced Daoist and Buddhist notions, particularly those pertaining to spiritual self-cultivation. The ensuing creative tension between these intertwined lines of thought inspired new interpretations of classical texts and pushed Confucianism beyond its traditional boundaries. Among these thinkers, Zhu Xi singles out a select few as the “Masters of the Northern Song,” a group that included Zhou Dunyi, Shao Yong (1011-1077), Zhang Zai (1020-1077), and the aforementioned Cheng brothers. While it would be wrong to consider these men as forming an institutionalized school, they were united in the view that a society based on the Way could only be achieved through personal reform grounded in cultivation of the xin (“mind-heart”) to harmonize Heaven, Earth, and Humanity.

2. Works

For such an influential figure, Zhou authored surprisingly few works. In fact, of the 622 passages in Reflections on Things at Hand, only 12 are by Zhou—far fewer than the number of passages from Zhang Zai and the Chengs. Most people know Zhou for his essay “Explanation of the Diagram of the Supreme Polarity” (Taijitu shuo) along with his extensive commentary, Penetrating the Classic of Changes (Tongshu). Both texts focus on cosmology as well as the ethical and spiritual implications of their depictions of the cosmos, and both texts continue to exert tremendous influence on Chinese thought. In addition, Zhou is credited with “On the Love of the Lotus” (Ai lian shuo), a short poetic essay that, like many such works, reveals unexpected philosophical depths.

a. “Explanation of the Diagram of the Supreme Polarity”

According to tradition, Zhu Xi was so struck by this treatise that he placed it at the beginning of Reflections on Things at Hand, thereby assuring it pride of place in Neo-Confucian thought. Broadly speaking, it has two main parts: the essay itself, which outlines the evolution of the cosmos, and the accompanying “Diagram” (taiji tu), a graphic illustration of the cosmic process described.

Taiji Tu from an ancient Chinese text

The main theme of the Diagram is simple: the human and cosmic realms are governed by the same norms; the microcosm and the macrocosm correspond perfectly. Much like earlier Chinese thinkers, Zhou proclaims that human life (including the socio-political realm) is rooted in the Way of Heaven, and that it is the duty of the sage-ruler to ensure that the cosmic and human realms harmonize. Nonetheless, Zhou presents this cosmology in a particularly powerful manner, prompting later thinkers to consider the “Explanation” a true masterpiece.

A close look at the “Explanation” yields interesting insights. The treatise can be divided into six parts, each corresponding to certain figures in the Diagram. Part 1 begins with the mysterious “Non-Polarity” (wuji), the primordial yet indefinite source of all reality, which Zhou identifies with the “Supreme Polarity” (taiji), the core of actual existence. The taiji gives rise to yin and yang by alternating from stillness to activity and back. Part 2 picks up with the yin and yang, speaking of how their alternation and combination produces the Five Phases (wuxing: water, fire, wood, metal, earth), which in turn form the basis for the cycles of nature (the Four Seasons). In Part 3, Zhou circles back to include the wuji and taiji, the “Two Modes” (yin and yang), and the Five Phases, noting that the latter interact and stimulate one another, thus generating the myriad things of our world.

At this point, Zhou has covered the entire Diagram, yet the “Explanation” is only half finished. With Part 4, he shifts to humanity, which emerges from the cosmic processes and, as such, is governed by both yin and yang which together engender our “five-fold nature.” In Part 5, Zhou turns to the sage, the ideal Chinese ruler, who more clearly perceives and embodies the cosmic forces than the majority of humankind. Mirroring the cosmic rhythm, the sage addresses and “settles” human affairs through the Confucian virtues of centrality, correctness, humaneness, and rightness while abiding in “stillness.” Finally, in Part 6 Zhou turns to the Yijing (Classic of Changes), referring to the Sage’s wisdom as one that embraces cosmic and human truths.

Zhou makes liberal use of paradoxical language in the “Explanation,” notably in the first line where he both distinguishes the wuji and taiji yet joins them together. In doing so, Zhou suggests an equivalence, if not actual identity. Zhou continues in this same rhetorical mode, speaking of the incipient cosmos as both “still” and “active” in its functioning: “Activity and stillness alternate; each is the basis of the other.” In Part 2, Zhou proclaims that the Five Phases are fundamentally one—“simply yin and yang; yin and yang are simply the taiji”—while each has its own nature. Part 4 opens by declaring that humans have the “finest and most spiritually efficacious [qi],” thus singling us out for special consideration. Humans are distinct yet not separate from other beings or the processes of creation. Part 5 focuses on the sage, a mysterious figure who manages human affairs effortlessly, as though he were the the working of nature. Finally, Zhou concludes by stating “Great indeed is the Yijing! Herein lies its excellence!” By closing on this note of awe, Zhou suggests that his treatise proffers a glimpse of the Sage’s cosmic vision.

Zhou’s “Explanation” is simultaneously stirring, enlightening, yet maddeningly mysterious, and this air of mystery is a source of the text’s power. The mystery deepens as Zhou leads us through the Diagram, largely because he describes rather than explains the various figures, and he is strangely silent on some of the Diagram’s aspects. The essay, thus, resembles a theological treatise, laying out basic teachings derived from “scripture,” such as the Yijing, and relating them in a coherent way. In this regard, it resembles the Nicene Creed, a formal statement of core beliefs shared by many traditional Christians. Like the Creed, Zhou’s “Explanation” assumes its readers are familiar with its ideas, presenting them as “articles of faith” but never arguing for why these things should be the case.

b. Penetrating the Classic of Changes

This work comprises forty chapters in all yet since each chapter is only a paragraph or so in length, it is still relatively short. Ostensibly, the title Tongshu comes from Zhou’s insistence that its principles penetrate (tong) and harmonize with the Yijing. The treatise also draws on the Zhongyong (Doctrine of the Mean), the Shujing (Classic of History), and the Analects. It is likely that the “Explanation” was originally the last section of the Tongshu but that Zhu Xi moved it to the beginning; eventually, it became an independent work due to its importance in Neo-Confucian thought.

The treatise’s main themes are central to the Neo-Confucian project: the necessity of authenticity (cheng) in attaining Sageliness, and how to enact Sageliness in accord with the cosmos to establish the true Way (Dao). Zhang Boxing (1652-1725), who compiled the Complete Collection of Zhou Dunyi’s Writings (Zhou Lianxi xiansheng quanji), divides the Tongshu into two parts, each comprising 20 chapters. Certain ideas and concerns link various chapters but a detailed presentation lies beyond the scope of this entry. Instead, this overview highlights key points and includes quotes to provide a sense of Zhou’s voice and style.

Part 1: Tongshu, Chapters 1-20

The first half of the treatise begins with a stirring proclamation: “Being authentic is the foundation of the sage.” Over the next few chapters, Zhou then touches on several traditionally Confucian topics: the importance of moral virtue, the necessity of learning, how to govern properly, and so forth. Not surprisingly, Zhou grounds each of these human concerns in the workings of the cosmos, much as we have seen with the “Explanation.” However, there are a few points in this first half that make the Tongshu rather unique and thus warrant close attention.

Chapters 7-10, for instance, consist of questions from unnamed students and Zhou’s replies, thereby rhetorically underscoring the essentially pedagogical and dialogical nature of Confucianism. Hearkening back to the example of Confucius, the text presumes that the reader is engaging with the teachings as if face-to-face with the teacher, the “old model,” (laoshi) who, in this case, is Zhou himself. Chapter 7 (appropriately entitled “The Teacher”) opens: “Someone asks: ‘Who makes all under Heaven good?’” Reply: “The teacher.” Question: “What do you mean?” Reply: “[He is one whose] nature is simply in equilibrium between firm and yielding good and evil.” Over the next few chapters, the Teacher reminds us of the good fortune at being able to correct our errors, the importance of thinking as an activity rooted in our primal authenticity, and stresses devotion to learning as we progress towards Sageliness.

Chapters 17-19, on the other hand, deal with what might seem to be a minor consideration: music, and, by extension, the “arts” in general. However, this topic is, in fact, central to Confucianism, which consistently upholds the importance of cultural refinement (wen) as part of the Way. Echoing words from Confucius himself, Zhou speaks of music as a positive influence on people, helping attune them to each other. Thus he says in chapter 17, “[The ancient sages and kings] created music to give expression to the airs of the eight [directional] winds and to pacify the dispositions of all under Heaven.” Not only does music attune the mind-hearts of all people, it also harmonizes us with animals and spiritual beings. We see in this short section the inseparability of the aesthetic, ethical, and spiritual dimensions of sagely learning.

Chapter 20 both summarizes Zhou’s points so far and leads us into the next half. It is fitting, then, that the chapter is entitled “Learning to be a Sage,” and, like chapters 7-10, it is a dialogue between student and teacher. The teacher explains the essentials of the Way of the sage, saying, “Unity is essential. To be unified is to have no desire. Without desire one is unoccupied when still and direct when active. Being unoccupied when still, one will be clear; being clear one will be penetrating. Being direct in activity one will be impartial; being impartial one will be all-embracing. Being clear and penetrating, impartial and all-embracing, one is almost [a sage].”

The Daoist flavor in the first half of the Tongshu is unmistakable, but Zhou is not suggesting that the sage observes the world with an empty mind. Rather, he observes that striving for sageliness means uniting all of one’s faculties. Rooted in one’s true nature, undistracted by wayward desires, and unoccupied by selfish lusts or passing whims, one is directly involved with all things. One can then see clearly and thus respond appropriately.

Part 2: Tongshu, Chapters 21-40

This second half of the Tongshu shifts from the more metaphysical stance of the first part to a more explicitly ethical orientation. Zhou starts off in a typically Confucian fashion by focusing on governing society, stressing the importance of being “impartial” (gong) —scrupulously avoiding selfishness—in order to attain “clarity” (ming). Much like the “Explanation,” the first few chapters correlate moral virtue with the cosmic processes of yin, yang, and the wu xing. Following contemporary Confucian Tu Weiming, we can say that Zhou articulates an “anthropocosmic” vision here. However, the references to the Zhongyong as well as the necessity for intelligence in perceiving truth remind us that metaphysical knowledge is but the first step towards enacting the Way.

One of the most interesting things in this second half of the Tongshu is the central role played by Yan Yuan (Yan Hui), Confucius’ most mystically-inclined disciple. At one point, for instance, Zhou exalts Yan Hui’s example: “Seeing what was great, his mind was at peace. With his mind at peace, nothing was insufficient. With nothing insufficient, then wealth and honor, poverty and humble station were all the same [to him]. Being all the same, then he was able to transform and equalize [others, that is regard others as equal]. Thus Yanzi [ Yan Hui] was second only to the Sage [Confucius].” Zhou underscores this same point a little later on in chapter 29 where Zhou exalts Confucius’ “comprehensiveness,” after which he immediately praises Yan Hui as the only one who was able to discern this quality and model it for succeeding generations.

While the entire Tongshu draws on the Yijing, it focuses most explicitly on that work in the last 10 chapters. Much of this section reads as if Zhou were leading the reader through a ritual consultation of that most enigmatic of Chinese classics, referring to hexagrams #1, 24, 25, and 37, among others. Furthermore, it quotes passages from the Xici (“Appended Remarks”), the most philosophically rich section of the Yijing.

Zhou begins the last section of the treatise (chapters 37-40) very simply, invoking the cosmic basis of the sagely Way and stressing the sage’s impartiality while recalling the pedagogical dialogue of earlier sections: “The Way of the sage is perfectly impartial,” I said. Someone asked, “What does that mean?” I replied, “Heaven and Earth are perfectly impartial.” Finally, in the very last chapter, Zhou concludes the Tongshu by giving guidance towards the sagely Way through lines of the Yijing. The last few sentences warrant special attention: “Be cautious! This means [to follow] the ‘timely mean’! ‘Keep the back still,’ for the back is not seen. When still, one can stop [at the right point]. To stop is not to act [deliberately]. To act [deliberately] is not to stop [at the right point]. This Way is profound!”

All told, the Tongshu is a rich, evocative text, appropriately mirroring the mysterious and compelling wisdom of the Yijing. Zhou’s elusive yet allusive style draws on multiple sources, encouraging the reader to make connections between the different sections and events within her own life. While revealing an inspiring cosmic vision, however, it continually reminds readers that its truth can only be realized when enacted daily.

c. “On the Love of the Lotus”

While not a philosophical treatise, “On the Love of the Lotus” (Ai lian shuo) remains Zhou’s most beloved work and reveals surprising spiritual depths. According to tradition, Zhou composed the poem in 1071 after he built his retreat, Lianxi, at the foot of Mount Lu. As was common practice among retired literati (Chinese scholar-bureaucrats), he dug a pond in front of his study and planted it with lotus blossoms, spending much of his leisure time contemplating the scene.

“On the Love of the Lotus” totals some 119 characters in addition to its title, arranged in eleven lines. Each of the lines is a couplet of verses, varying in length. Zhou wrote this piece in the gu wen (“ancient writing”) style, a literary style hearkening back to the elegant prose of the Han dynasty. This style had become increasingly common during the Confucian Renaissance, was a favorite of the late Tang Confucian critic Han Yu, and contrasts with the “parallel prose” style that had dominated Chinese prose previously with the latter’s very strict meter and rhyme scheme. During the Song era, gu wen became the style of choice among the literati, and was a rhetorical signal that the writer and reader were dealing with a work of “special writing” concerning high-minded ideals, versus low or vulgar subjects, much as “the King’s English” functioned in the British Empire during the 19^th and 20^th centuries. A mark of education and culture, gu wen was still accessible to a degree by members of the lower classes, and thus exemplified the power of wen as a culturally binding force among the Chinese populace.

On the surface, “On the Love of the Lotus” is Zhou’s heartfelt ode to the flourishing blossoms in his garden, evoking the serene presence of flowering chrysanthemums, peonies, and lotuses, each with its distinctive aura and beautiful form. Yet, the piece hints at subtle depths of meaning, pointing to the anthropocosmic vision that Zhou so explicitly discusses in his other works. For Zhou, the lotus exemplifies the cosmic/spiritual harmony that we should all seek. Thus he says, “Inside, it is open; outside, it is straight (zhi)” – a line recalling the time-honored Chinese ideal of Dao. Zhou contrasts this with the chrysanthemum, which is the “recluse” among the flowers, and the peony, which he speaks of as “wealthy,” or showy, gaudy, and appealing to the masses. The lotus, on the other hand, is the “gentleman among flowers.” The term “gentleman” (junzi), of course, has since the time of Confucius been the ideal human being.

Like other Chinese literary works, “On the Love of the Lotus” draws on cultural tropes shared by Confucian, Daoist, and Buddhist traditions. This is most obvious with the image of the lotus itself. As Zhou writes, “I love only the lotus, for rising from the mud yet remaining unstained; bathed by pure currents and yet not seductive.” “On the Love of the Lotus” pulses with subtle yet powerful symbolism, evoking a deep, tranquil mood while encouraging a dynamic and attentive state of awareness. It thus gives a glimpse of the sagely mind itself.

3. Key Concepts

Zhou’s works, while creative and eclectic in nature, establish the basic parameters of Neo-Confucian philosophy. While he never articulates a full-fledged system, most of the concepts he discusses support each other. This overview, therefore, looks at key themes running through Zhou’s writings, explaining what they entail and how they connect to each other.

a. Fundamental Unity within Diversity

A perennial issue in philosophy as expressed in all cultures is the relationship between the myriads of phenomena in the world, which are diverse and seemingly constantly changing, and the underlying unity and stability within this vast whole. A pond is filled with dozens of lotus blossoms, each distinct and with its own unique hue, some in bloom while others wither. Yet all seem to embody the same “lotus-ness,” and each specific blossom remains its own, separate self throughout its life cycle. Similarly, our world is peopled with thousands of different human beings, and every single person has his or her own unique background, thoughts and feelings. And yet, each person’s life follows a similar pattern and each person embodies the same “human-ness.” What is the relationship between the oneness and many-ness that characterizes our world? This problem, the problem of “the One and the Many,” lies at the heart of many of the world’s philosophies, from the Pre-Socratics of ancient Greece, such as Thales, Anaximander, Heraclitus, and others, to the nameless ṛṣis who composed the Upaniṣads, to the various thinkers of classical Chinese civilization. While answers have varied, most solutions assume that the world is “one thing” and so there has to be a unifying aspect to the obvious diversity.

For Zhou Dunyi, the answer is that a fundamental unity encompasses the myriads of things, including human beings. This unity, however, does not consist in some static metaphysical mush wherein all things collapse into a formless One, nor some immaterial Divine Being (“God”). Rather, this unity is a dynamic, integrated system in which all things function together. We can see this clearly in the Tongshu, chapter 22, where Zhou succinctly summarizes the cosmic process: “The two [modes of] qi and the five phases transform and generate the myriad things. The five are the differentia and the two are the actualities; the two are fundamentally one. Thus the many are one, and the one actuality is divided into the many.”

Despite such an all-encompassing metaphysical scheme, Zhou maintains the decidedly human focus typically associated with Confucianism, offering an anthropocosmic vision in which the root metaphors for understanding humanity itself are drawn from the workings of Nature. We can see this most clearly in Zhou’s “Explanation,” where he quotes from the commentary section of the Yijing: “the sage’s virtue equals that of Heaven and Earth; his clarity equals that of the sun and the moon; his timeliness equals that of the four seasons.” In this passage Zhou describes the Way of the sage, the ideal of humanity, in explicitly cosmological terms. Rhetorically, the message is clear: the Way of humanity is the Way of the cosmos.

Students of Chinese thought may recognize in Zhou’s metaphysical vision yet another variant of the notion of humanity forming a triad with Heaven and Earth, perhaps best expressed in the statement, “the unity of Heaven and Humanity” (tianren heyi). This harmonious unity of human beings and the cosmos lies at the center of Zhou’s philosophy and draws quite explicitly on earlier Confucian thinkers, notably Dong Zhongshu (c. 195-105 B.C.E.). In some respects, Zhou Dunyi merely expands upon this basis by borrowing insights from Buddhism and Daoism which he integrates into Confucian tradition. Human beings, along with all other natural phenomena, are integral parts of a larger whole, and in Zhou’s view, we can see this teaching both metaphysically and ethically. Julia Ching suggests that, under Buddhist influence, this idea transformed into the increasingly abstract adage “The Ten Thousand Things are One” (wanwu yiti), and although we can see aspects of such “pantheism” in Zhou’s writings, he never advocates pure withdrawal into metaphysical contemplation; for Zhou, embracing the actual embodied situation trumps mystical wonder.

Not surprisingly, this insistence on a non-dual unity-cum-diversity defies clear articulation. As with many mystical philosophers (for example, Zhuangzi, Huineng, Pseudo-Dionysius, Śaṅkara, Ibn Arabi, and others), Zhou often resorts to the language of paradox. Perhaps the most famous example is in the opening words of the “Explanation”: wuji er taiji (“Non-Polar(ity), and yet Supreme Polarity!”). This most curious of lines is comprised of a negation and a positive affirmation linked by a conjunction. Grammatically, this phrase both distinguishes the wuji and taiji yet joins them together in some sort of identity. This simultaneous identity and difference echoes chapter one of the Daodejing: ce liang zhe tong chu er yi ming (“these two [wu – ‘non-being’ – and you –‘being’] interpenetrate, yet, after emerging, differ in name”). Zhou resorts to paradox elsewhere in his writings as well. Rhetorically, paradoxical language poses difficulty for rational understanding. No doubt this more mystical dimension of Zhou’s work has encouraged interpretations that emphasize his debts to Daoism and Buddhism.

The paradoxical harmonious unity of humanity and the larger cosmos also shows in Zhou’s discussion of “stillness” and “activity.” As the second line of the “Explanation” reads: “The Supreme Polarity in activity generates yang; yet at the limit of activity it is still. In stillness it generates yin; yet at the limit of stillness it is active. Activity and stillness alternate; each is the basis of the other.” Much like yin and yang, so cosmic stillness and activity are complementary opposites, not antithetical, but rather co-entailing each other. This cosmic pattern forms the model for the sage as well, who remains still in the midst of activity but also active while keeping still. Such active stillness and still activity expresses the fundamental dynamism governing existence as a whole.

One issue that arises with Zhou’s notion of unity within diversity is whether he is speaking strictly cosmologically, concerning the “physical” functioning of the reality, or metaphysically, concerning the ultimate structure of the cosmos. Zhou’s writings are ambiguous on this point, and lend themselves to both readings. A. C. Graham, however, argues that Zhou is speaking cosmologically, and that the tendency to read Zhou metaphysically is due to Zhu Xi’s reading in which he equates the taiji with li (principle).

Zhou provides a subtle way to understand the psychological dimension of such unity when he speaks of “impartiality” (gong). One who is “impartial” remains unswayed by petty desires, and thus can respond to any situation without complications. As Zhou says, “Being direct in activity, one will be impartial; being impartial one will be all-embracing.” There is no sense of withdrawal, but rather an active embracing of existence. Moreover, such engaging with the world at large is the sage’s Way, a state that mirrors the cosmos.

b. Human Nature

Zhou’s anthropocosmic vision, centering as it does on the unity of Heaven, humanity, and all things, entails a specific notion of human nature (xing). Indeed, discussion of human nature is one of the hallmarks of Neo-Confucian tradition. Unlike the Chengs and Zhu Xi, Zhou does not explicitly spell out his view of human nature, but we can infer quite a lot from his writings.

Zhou never uses the actual term xing in the “Explanation” but he mentions it several times in the Tongshu. Much like what we see in Mencius and the Zhongyong, Zhou implies that the nature of human beings is endowed by Heaven and is fundamentally good. Zhou once more turns to the Yijing: “”The alternation of yin and yang is called the Way. That which issues from it is good. That which fulfills [ or constitutes] it is human nature.” Zhou closes this important chapter on a particularly reverent note: “Great indeed is change, the source of human nature and endowment!” Further on in chapter 3, Zhou extolls behavior in accord with the Five Constant Virtues (humanness, righteousness, propriety, wisdom, and honesty), observing that “One who is by nature like this, at ease like this, is called a sage. One who recovers it and holds onto it is called a worthy.”

Clearly, Zhou espouses the Mencian view of human nature as innately good. Human beings are naturally moral creatures. However, there is a tension in Zhou’s philosophical anthropology, in that the distinction between good and evil does not reside at the primary level of cosmic origin. As he states in the “Explanation”: “Only humans receive the finest and most spiritually efficacious [qi]. Once they are formed, they are born; when spirit [shen] is manifested, they have intelligence; when their fivefold natures are stimulated into activity, good and evil are distinguished and the myriad affairs ensue.” Similarly, in chapter 3 of the Tongshu Zhou cryptically says, “In being authentic there is no [intentional] acting [wuwei]. In incipience there is good and evil.” Here Zhou’s insistence on stillness as cosmically fundamental means that this ultimate level transcends the distinction between good and evil; the latter distinction only arises when human beings begin to interact with actual things. Later commentators have spilled much ink arguing about what Zhou means.

Broadly speaking, Zhou espouses the cultivation of the “mind-heart” (xin) that became a hallmark of Neo-Confucian religiosity, yet he apparently draws heavily on Daoism. Certainly Zhou uses terms often associated with Daoist neidan (“inner alchemy”), notably qi, the basic “stuff” of the universe, shen (“spirit”), and even jing (“essence”), although he mentions the latter only once or twice. By contrast, Zhou says quite a bit about shen, which he associates with cognitive abilities. Thus, as Zhou observes in the Tongshu, “That which ‘penetrates when stimulated’ is spirit (shen).” Apparently shen lies dormant until it is stimulated by external phenomena, at which point it is activated and “knowing” begins.

The place of qi in Zhou’s view of human nature is vague. That is, qi is a vital component of human beings and all things, yet Zhou never discusses it to the same extent that we find in the writings of later Neo-Confucians. Nor does he differentiate it explicitly from “Principle” (li). In the “Explanation,” Zhou speaks of the wu xing as the basic phases of qi, and hence fundamental to the workings of the cosmos, going on to note that “Only humans receive the finest and most spiritually efficacious [qi].” This statement implies that human nature is unique; people have a special status in the world albeit not as beings of a different order than the myriads of other things. Joseph Adler suggests that for Zhou, humans naturally manifest shen because they are endowed with the most refined qi. It is due to the functioning of shen, then, that we are able to encompass all things. Here, Zhou clearly anticipates later Neo-Confucian views concerning human cultivation as a refining of qi, although he does not speak of differences between people in terms of the “coarseness” and “refinement” of qi. We should note, however, that he does not articulate the full explanation we find in Zhu Xi’s works.

c. Authenticity as Humanity’s Ethical and Ontological Basis

Following the spiritual current of Confucian tradition exemplified in Mencius and the Zhongyong, Zhou maintains that authenticity (cheng) is essential to be fully human. In fact, Zhou opens the Tongshu by declaring, “Being authentic is the foundation of the sage.” He goes on to add that it is “the foundation of the Five Constant [Virtues]” as well as being “perfectly easy, yet difficult to practice.” Later, he underscores this rather paradoxical point by saying, “In being authentic, there is no [intentional] acting.” This seems decidedly Daoist (Zhou actually uses the term wuwei here), but Zhou’s meaning can only be understood through it. For Zhou, authenticity expresses human nature as it truly is; to be authentic is to manifest one’s Heavenly endowment. Speaking metaphorically, to be authentic is to remain still in one’s nature while acting in the world. Authenticity is, thus, both ontological and ethical; it is a manifestation of our fundamental being, while also serving as the root of moral activity.

For Zhou, being authentic is intimately tied to self-cultivation, a central concern of Song Confucianism that forms the heart of Neo-Confucian spirituality. In some sense, authenticity is a “given,” as it is rooted in our nature, yet we must work to develop it, just as with any innate ability. Zhou stresses the importance of such ethical/ontological striving throughout the Tongshu. Moreover, Zhou states that it is possible to be inauthentic (bu cheng) when in chapter 2 of the Tongshu he speaks of the Five Constant [Virtues] and the “hundred practices” of moral behavior as being “wrong” or “blocked by depravity and confusion.” Presumably, such cases arise when one is gripped by selfishness and egotism.

One of the most intriguing and controversial points that Zhou makes about striving for authenticity is that, being authentic, a way of retuning to one’s true human nature, is also the way for a person to “become One” (yi). Moreover, Zhou also says that to be in such a state is “to have no desire.” Zhou strikes a decidedly mystical tone here, with a slight ascetic edge that resonates strongly with Buddhism and Daoism. Contra Max Weber, the sociologist of religion who famously distinguished between ascetic and mystical forms of religion, Zhou suggests a spirituality that straddles this dichotomy. Certainly when read in context, Zhou actually seems to mean a state of clear, yet active engagement with one’s situation. Zhu Xi and later commentators, perhaps at pains to distance Zhou from accusations of Buddhist and Daoist influence, explain that Zhou means that one should attain an unbiased, undistracted state rather than renounce the world.

d. Inseparability of Ethical Life from the Workings of the Cosmos

As we have seen in his understanding of authenticity, Zhou also proclaims the integral relationship of cosmology and ethics. While this is a central theme in the “Explanation” and the Tongshu, one of the best hints of this point comes in “On the Love of the Lotus,” where he refers to the lotus blossom as the “gentleman (junzi) among flowers.” The junzi, the “noble person,” is the highest ethical ideal in early Confucianism and, essentially, the equivalent of the Sage in Neo-Confucian tradition. What’s more, not only is Zhou speaking of a natural phenomenon — a blossoming lotus flower — in moral terms here, he is also underscoring the deeply aesthetic dimension involved. Like the beautiful lotus, so the junzi marks the full flowering of human life.

The intertwining of the ethical and cosmological in Zhou’s thought shows, above all, in his practical focus. Throughout the “Explanation” and the Tongshu, Zhou speaks of our sagely dimension in dynamic, active terms. Be it in his admonitions regarding continual striving, his reminders of the importance of ordering society, and his cautious approach to acting in the world, Zhou maintains that the moral life reflects the cosmic order; sagely behavior is in tune with the creative guidance of Heaven and the nurturing vitality of Earth.

In his work, Zhou freely mixes metaphysical and ethical language, switching from one to the other effortlessly, like a sage acting in accordance with the cosmos by establishing a good society following Confucian moral teachings. Thus as he notes in the “Explanation,” “Only humans receive the finest and most spiritually efficacious [qi]. Once formed, they are born; when spirit (shen) is manifested, they have intelligence; when their fivefold natures are stimulated into activity, good and evil are distinguished and the myriad affairs ensue. The sage settles these [affairs] with centrality (zhong) and correctness (zheng), humanity (ren) and rightness (yi). . ..”

One final point that has some bearing on the inseparability of ethics from the working of the cosmos in Zhou’s work is how it may anticipate some of the views of Wang Yangming (Wang Shouren, 1472-1529), specifically the inseparability of “innate (moral) knowledge” (liangzhi) from action. In Zhou’s perspective, a sage is rooted in authenticity; as he says in the Tongshu, “being a sage is nothing more than being authentic.” Moreover, he later states, “Being perfectly authentic, one acts.” In other words, to be a sage is to act in an authentic (sagely) way. In a similar vein, Wang explains to his student Xu Ai in Instructions for Practical Living (Chuanxilu), “There have never been people who know but do not act. Those who are supposed to know but do not act simply do not know yet.” It seems that both Zhou and Wang would agree with Socrates’ famous dictum that “to know the good is to do the good.”

e. Sageliness as Ideal for Daily Life

The concept of sageliness as an idea to be actualized in daily life is implicit in the previous point regarding Zhou and Wang Yangming. Even a cursory reading of the “Explanation” and the Tongshu reveals Zhou’s concern for putting sagely ideals into practice. As Zhou says, “To be active and correct is called the Way.” In the introduction to A Short History of Chinese Philosophy, Feng Youlan quotes one of his colleagues as saying, “Chinese philosophers were all of them different grades of Socrates. . . With him, philosophy was hardly ever merely a pattern of ideas exhibited for human understanding, but was a system of precepts internal to the conduct of the philosopher.” (A Short History of Chinese Philosophy, 10). This passage reads as if it were written specifically about Zhou himself. Clearly for Zhou, the true goal should be to realize sageliness, that is, to discover it and make it concretely real here and now.

Zhou makes clear that the sage as ideal must be engaged with society and the larger world. Not only does the sage “settle these [affairs],” according to the “Explanation,” but Zhou gives extensive guidance for sagely action in the world throughout the Tongshu. Perhaps his most succinct discussion comes in chapter 6: “The Way of the sages is nothing more than humanity and rightness, centrality and correctness. Preserve it and it will be valuable. Practice it and it will be beneficial. Enlarge it and it will match Heaven-and-earth.” The sage is actively involved with things, guided by morality rooted in the cosmos. We should remember, though, that this ideal is also profoundly spiritual, suggesting an “inner worldly mysticism” that embraces all of life.

Understandably, Zhou’s concern for sageliness manifests in the various models he upholds for our emulation. The most obvious example is Confucius, whom Zhou often quotes and to whom Zhou explicitly devotes two chapters (38 and 39) of the Tongshu. Zhou also holds up Confucius’ disciple Zilu and the legendary Fuxi, who is credited with writing the hexagrams of the Yijing. However, Zhou reserves special reverence for Yan Hui, that most spiritual of Confucius’ disciples. Thus when discussing the comprehensive nature of the sage, Zhou writes, “Master Yan was the one who brought out the Sage’s comprehensiveness and taught ten thousand generations without limit. Was he not equally profound?” Interestingly, Zhou himself plays a similar role for later Neo-Confucians, who held him up as a model of authenticity.

4. Principal Concerns

As is the case with all significant thinkers, Zhou Dunyi’s work provides a wealth of material for further analysis. Some of the concerns that Zhou deals with are of universal philosophical interest while others are rather unique to Chinese, or even more specifically, Confucian, thought.

a. Lineage

In traditional Chinese culture, wherein family relations lie at the center of social life and identity, lineage is paramount. This is true not just socially and politically, but in scholarly circles as well; after all, most “schools” of Chinese thought are called jia (“family”). Indeed, it is a cliché to say that Chinese society is envisioned as a large family with the emperor (“Son of Heaven”) as its father. To be true to one’s jia is crucial; to deviate from its ways or to step outside its bounds is to bring shame upon the larger family, including the ancestors, and risk severe punishment, even ostracism. To have a disreputable lineage or one that is haphazard or unknown is highly suspect in polite circles. For scholars, lineal connection to earlier thinkers is a necessity, since that helps certify that one has truly received Dao. The Way, if it is to continue, must be transmitted to succeeding generations. The fact, then, that Zhou’s teachings have a questionable lineage was a major concern in later Confucian circles. In the preface to his “Conversations of Master Zhu, Arranged Topically” (Zhuzi yulei) 94:3153, Zhu Xi gets to the heart of the matter when he says, “No one knows where his (Zhou Dunyi’s) teaching tradition came from.”

Most contemporary scholars agree that Zhou’s inclusion in the “orthodox” lineage of Song Neo-Confucianism is due to efforts of Zhu Xi in the late 12^th century. Almost from the start, Zhu faced conflict from various sources, notably the Lu brothers, Lu Jishuo (1120s-1190s) and Lu Jiyuan (1139-1193), two literati who argued that Zhou is far too Daoist to be considered a recipient of the Confucian Way. In addition, there are historical issues with Zhou’s alleged connection to the Cheng brothers, among them the fact that Cheng Yi declares that his older brother Cheng Hao personally rediscovered the Way via his study of the Classics. What’s more, neither of the Chengs refer to Zhou in terms typically reserved for teachers; instead, they call him by his personal names. Additionally, none of the Chengs’ disciples even mention Zhou in their writings. All together, these points call into question Zhou’s place in the direct line of Confucian transmission.

Joseph Adler and others investigated the historical and biographical records and discovered that during the latter part of Zhu Xi’s life there was a concerted effort on the part of Zhu and Hunan scholar-officials to elevate Zhou to sagely status despite prevailing opinion at the time – an endeavor that culminated during the reign of Emperor Lizong (1225-1264). For his part, Zhu Xi sidesteps the tenuous historical connection by attributing the source of Zhou’s sagely mind to a transcendent source. Thus, as Zhu writes in a record of his personal pilgrimage to the place of Zhou’s study:

“As for Master [Zhou] Lianxi, if he did not receive the propagation of this Dao by Heaven, how did he continue it so easily after such a long interruption, and bring it to light so abruptly after such extreme darkness? . . The Five Planets were in conjunction in Kui [a phase of lunar activity used to structure the ancient Chinese calendar], marking a turning point in culture. Only then did the heterogeneous qi homogenize and the divided [qi] coalesce; a clear and bright endowment was received in its entirety by one man, and the Master [Zhou Dunyi] appeared. Without following a teacher, he silently registered the substance of the Way, constructed the Diagram and attached a text to it, to give an ultimate foundation to the essentials. . . Ah! Such grandeur! Were it not for what Heaven conferred [on Zhou], how could we participate in this?”

Such appeals to Divine Authority, however, raise philosophical problems too numerous to discuss here.

b. Daoist and Buddhist Influences

Daoist and Buddhist influences on Zhou’s thought also warrant serious attention, particularly in light of the controversies surrounding Zhou’s lineage and Zhu Xi’s rather strained efforts to rope him into the Confucian camp. One common, albeit simplistic, view of Neo-Confucianism is that it began in the Southern Song (1127-1279) in response to widespread political, social, and cultural dislocation after the collapse of the Northern Song (960-1126). With the loss of Chinese territories, especially the Yellow River Valley, the traditional Chinese “heartland,” to non-Han invaders, various scholar-officials sought to re-claim a distinctly Chinese identity linked to Confucianism. As part of their efforts, they reformed the civil service system by purging it of Daoist and Buddhist elements. In doing so, they also diminished the political and institutional power of both rival “Ways” and articulated a philosophically robust Confucian philosophy that could hold its own against Buddhist and Daoist wisdom. Ironically, most contemporary scholars agree that Neo-Confucianism owes a great deal to Daoist and Buddhist ideas and practices.

Without doubt, Zhou’s connections to Daoism are deep. The diagram that Zhou uses in his “Explanation,” for instance, strongly resembles several others used by Daoists, such as the Wujitu (“Wuji Diagram”), which is included in the Daoist Canon (Daozang) and the Xiantian taiji tu (“Taiji Diagram which predates Heaven”). While there is some debate about the details, the prevalent view is that Zhou received his diagram from Mu Xiu (979-1032), a minor official who himself received it from Chong Fang (956-1015), a former official turned recluse. Chong Fang, in turn, received the diagram from Chen Tuan (d. 989), a famous Daoist master. Several key terms that Zhou uses – wuji and wuwei, for example – also have Daoist associations, and Zhou’s priority on “stillness” over “activity” also has a strongly Daoist overtone.

Zhou’s work also shows marked influence of Buddhism. For instance, Cheng Yi refers to Zhou as a “poor Chan [Zen] fellow,” and records indicate that Zhou counted several Buddhists among his friends and teachers, notably Shou Ya, a master at the Helin Temple in Jiangsu province. It is possible that Zhou was even a Buddhist layman (upasaka) for a time. Some scholars suggested connections to the work of Guifeng Zongmi (781-841), a patriarch in both the Chan and Huayan schools of Chinese Buddhism. Zhou’s discussion of the sage as having “no desire” and being “impartial” also resonate with the Buddhist virtue of upeksha (“equanimity”) and the ideal of mahakaruna (“great compassion”).

All told, it is impossible to deny influences, direct and indirect, of Daoism and Buddhism on Zhou Dunyi. The various issues surrounding such influences on Zhou may not matter much, however, to students of global philosophy. In fact, they may only be problematic for those who share a more traditional Confucian concern for purity of lineage, or for scholars who approach the study of Chinese (and, indeed, all of East Asian) philosophy and religion with more Western assumptions of exclusivity. This is not to deny the historical difficulties in pinning down Zhou’s religious and philosophical pedigree or the problems it caused later Confucian thinkers, but only to note that such concerns in no way detract from his philosophical and spiritual insights.

c. Criticism of Other Thinkers

Zhou’s oracular style (characterized by pronouncements), the fact that his writings consist mainly of commentary on the Classics, and his overall religious tone give the impression that he is not a “philosopher” in the modern academic sense. He is not, in other words, a thinker who critically engages with other thinkers, using logical arguments to disprove certain truth claims while establishing other ones; however, when we read carefully, we can see a number of implicit criticisms of rival thinkers.

One example is in the Tongshu, chapter 16, where in distinguishing “things” (having physical form) and “spirit” (shen) he observes, “Things, then, are not penetrating. Spirit renders the myriad things subtle.” This seems to be a counter assertion to the Huayan Buddhist doctrine of shi shi wu ai (“unobstruction of all phenomena,” that is, the interpenetration of all things). Shi shi wu ai, according to Neo-Confucians, effectively denies the reality of the actual world. In the next chapter, which is devoted to music and ritual, Zhou laments the present state of society: “Later generations have neglected ritual. Their governmental measures and laws have been in disorder. Rulers have indulged their material desires without restraint, and consequently the people below them have suffered bitterly.” This reads like standard Confucian boilerplate but its critical edge is unmistakable. In chapter 24, Zhou states, “The most revered thing in the world is the Way; the most honored is virtue; the most rare [difficult to attain] is the human being.” While the echoes of Laozi are unmistakable in Zhou’s praise for Dao and de, the fact that he immediately goes on to praise human beings as having a special status strikes a decidedly Confucian tone. Moreover, there are other examples of Zhou’s critical stance in the Tongshu. For instance, ( Zhou criticizes superficial scholars in chapters 28 and 34 whom, he says, are concerned with elegant literary style rather than striving for sageliness–a common Confucian theme.

These passages remind us that Zhou’s work did not emerge in an intellectual vacuum. He worked from a perspective deeply informed by certain basic ideas and assumptions that arose within a highly complex and contested philosophical milieu. Thus, as we can see, Zhou Dunyi takes a strongly critical stance in much of his writings. Moreover, he offers insightful, albeit oblique, observations that shed light not only on his own context, but that also address ethical, political, and metaphysical issues that crop up in other cultural contexts – one of the hallmarks of any great thinker.

d. Quietism

From a global philosophical perspective, Zhou seems to espouse a form of quietism, in that he emphasizes a more interior, contemplative approach to life rather than acting boldly to shape events through force of will. Although “quietism,” strictly speaking, refers to a Christian theological position that held sway during the 17^th century before being declared heretical by the Vatican, the centrality of attaining a detached, serene state of mind within Zhou’s writings strongly resonates with quietist doctrines. Such accusations of quietism are related to criticisms about the seemingly undue influence of Daoism and Buddhism on Zhou as well.

The charge of quietism is understandable in light of Zhou’s view of the relationship between stillness and activity. Stillness and activity co-entail each other, and, in fact, are just another way for Zhou to explain the interaction of yin and yang. Furthermore, Zhou does give priority to stillness as well – something several later Neo-Confucians express concerns about. The distinctly religious dimensions of Zhou’s work also make it easy for critics to dismiss him, especially in light of common stereotypes about mysticism as an excuse to withdraw into a timidly pious passive acceptance of things “just as they are.”

Nonetheless, arguments that Zhou espouses a passive quietism are, at best, straw men. Whatever his mystical inclinations, Zhou seems firmly focused on practical affairs. He draws heavily on Confucian directives on how to live a good life, and, in the Tongshu, explicitly attends to stereotypically “Confucian” concerns about education, ritual, and the proper governing of society, including the necessity for punishing wrongdoers. Even more to the point, Zhou provides clear instruction about activity, saying that one should pay attention and take great care when wielding power. As a thinker imbued with a sense of the Classical Chinese cultural heritage, Zhou repeatedly seeks guidance for engaging with life in authoritative sources, most especially the Yijing but also other Confucian texts such as the Analects, thereby anticipating Zhu Xi’s later comment that studying the classics is like meeting the sages face-to-face. Furthermore, as we have seen, Zhou holds up examples from Confucian history as models for our own behavior. While there are aspects of quietism in much of Zhou’s work, overall he does not advocate passive withdrawal, but a wise and attentive way of participating in the world without recklessly forcing it to conform to our selfish desires.

e. The Problem of Evil

Explaining evil, destruction, pain, cruelty, and so forth, has been a perennial problem for philosophers throughout history. Numerous solutions have been proposed over the centuries, ranging from the Christian doctrine of “original sin,” to the Buddhist and Hindu teaching that we are bemired in samsara (literally “wandering through,” the beginningless cycle of birth-and-death) due to fundamental ignorance underlying our incessant cravings and selfishness. For Chinese thinkers in general, evil is due to departure from Dao, which results in disharmony within individual, society and the world. Confucians are divided on some of the particulars here. Mencius, for example, holds that humans are innately good while Xunzi maintains that people are essentially animalistic. Both agree, however, that human beings can improve through the influence of a proper education and virtuous government.

Zhou by and large assumes a Mencian view of innate goodness, but he never spells it out explicitly. In the “Explanation” he states, “Only humans receive the finest and most spiritually efficacious [qi].” This seems to be an allusion to Mencius’ remark about nourishing his “vast, flowing qi” as a crucial component to moral and spiritual cultivation (Mencius 2A2), and certainly this is how Zhu Xi interprets Zhou. This view of human nature is also confirmed by passages in the Tongshu such as chapter 20, where Zhou affirms that sagehood can be learned by adhering to “the essentials” (being unified, without desire, clear, impartial, and so forth), most of which are associated with the exercise of moral virtue rooted in our Heavenly endowment.

Still, while Zhou clearly speaks of the fundamental goodness of humanity, he barely touches on evil itself. Of human beings, he says in the “Explanation,” “when their fivefold natures are stimulated into activity, good and evil are distinguished and the myriad affairs ensue.” Zhou repeats the same idea in the Tongshu, adding only that “In incipience there is good and evil.” The idea seems to be that good and evil, properly understood, only arise with the start of actual human activity. Does Zhou mean that one’s inherently good human nature, when coming into contact with external things, can give rise to actual good or evil affairs? It is unclear, but Zhou’s statements definitely provoked many later commentators. It is really only after Zhang Zai’s explanation of the role of qi that Neo-Confucians had a way to reconcile the Mencian view of fundamental goodness with the undeniable existence of evil in the world.

5. Legacy

Zhou Dunyi was a major influence on the development of Neo-Confucian metaphysics while the spiritual dimensions of his work continue to resonate with various thinkers. Wing-tsit Chan declares that the most accurate estimation of his work can be found in the comments of the later scholar Huang Bojia (1695), a passage that deserves to be quoted in full:

Since the time of Confucius and Mencius, Han (206 B.C.E.-220 C.E.) Confucianists merely had textual studies of the Classics. The subtle doctrines of the Way and the nature of man and things have disappeared for a long time. Master Zhou rose like a giant. . . . Although other Neo-Confucianists had opened the way, it was Master Zhou who brought light to the exposition of the subtlety and refinement of the mind, the nature, and moral principles.” (quoted in Chan, A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy, 461; pinyin romanization substituted for Wade-Giles in original).

C. Graham, however, argues in his landmark Two Chinese Philosophers: The Metaphysics of the Brothers Ch’eng that Zhou had little direct influence on these seminal thinkers. Certainly in light of evidence that Zhu Xi’s creative work in establishing the orthodox “transmission of the Way” (Daotong), we should not consider Zhou to be the historical “founder” of Neo-Confucianism.

Still, while any direct connection between Zhou and later Neo-Confucians is tenuous, his inspirational role cannot be doubted. One famous story, attributed to Cheng Hao in Reflections on Things at Hand, says that Zhou refused to cut the grass growing outside his window, saying, “[The feeling of the grass] and mine are the same.” While this tale seems the stuff of hagiography, it does give us a sense of the reverence for Zhou within Confucianism. Indeed, as an affirmation of the fundamental continuity of all life, this story is a poignant example of what living out Zhou’s metaphysical vision might be like. Such stories have helped cement the image of Zhou as a “latter day Sage,” an image that fits well with the specific models of Sageliness he holds up ( Yan Hui, Confucius, to name two). In this regard, it is noteworthy that in chapter 14 of Reflections on Things At Hand, entitled “On the Dispositions of Sages and Worthies,” Zhu Xi says of Zhou that “[his] mind was free, pure, and unobstructed, like a breeze on a sunny day and the clear moon.” Elsewhere, Zhu says that Zhou’s mind was “harmonious with the ‘Supreme Polarity’,” and that he “had the joy of Confucius and Yanzi.”

Joseph Adler argues that Zhou’s importance lies in the fact that his work provided a basis for Zhu Xi’s own religious practice. Specifically, Zhou’s teaching on the interrelationship of “stillness” and “activity” enabled Zhu to ground his methods of self-cultivation in the words of an earlier figure revered for his own spiritual example. Regardless, Zhou Dunyi is a profound thinker whose poetic words still provide philosophical and religious guidance.

6. References and Further Reading

Adler, Joseph A. Reconstructing the Confucian Dao: Zhu Xi’s Appropriation of Zhou Dunyi. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2014.
- The single best scholarly discussion of Zhou’s thought and his place within Neo-Confucianism currently available. In addition to his insightful analysis of the “Explanation” and the Tongshu, Adler argues that Zhou’s work provided the solution to Zhu Xi’s personal spiritual crisis by providing a cosmological and metaphysical underpinning for Zhu’s own religious practice. Includes clear annotated translations of the “Explanation” and the Tongshu along with Zhu Xi’s commentaries, prefaces, and postscripts, as well as passages from the writings (commentaries, prefaces and so forth) on Zhou’s work from other Neo-Confucian thinkers.
Adler, Joseph A. “Response and Responsibility: Chou Tun-I and Neo-Confucian Resources for Environmental Ethics.” In Confucianism and Ecology: The Interrelation of Heaven, Earth, and Humans, edited by Mary Evelyn Tucker and John Berthrong, 123-49. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Center for the Study of World Religions, 1998.
- Excellent discussion of Zhou’s thought highlighting the ecological dimensions of his ethical/spiritual scheme.
Adler, Joseph A. “Zhou Dunyi: The Metaphysics and Practice of Sagehood.” In Sources of Chinese Tradition, 2^nd ed., vol. 1, edited by Wm. Theodore de Bary and Irene Bloom, 669-78. New York: Columbia University Press, 1999.
- Good annotated English translations of Zhou’s “Explanation” in its entirety (including the Diagram itself) along with selections from the Tongshu (chapters 1, 3, 4, 16, and 20). Includes a useful introductory discussion of Zhou’s life and work.
Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
- A must-read for anyone interested in Chinese thought. Chan’s own perspective is heavily colored by Neo-Confucianism (particularly the Chen-Zhu line). Chapter 28 is devoted entirely to Zhou, and includes not only biographical information and philosophical analysis, but annotated English translations of both the “Explanation” and the Tongshu in their entirety.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. Reflections on Things at Hand: The Neo-Confucian Anthology Compiled by Chu Hsi and Lu Tsu-Ch’ien. New York: Columbia University Press, 1967.
- Masterful philosophical translation of the primary text of Neo-Confucian thought. Heavily annotated with a 27-page introduction that includes biographical information about Zhou and the other three “founders” of the Cheng-Zhu line. Also includes a 25-page glossary of key Chinese terms (Wade-Giles Romanization and traditional characters) and a short (11-page) essay entitled “On Translating Certain Chinese Philosophical Terms.” Not only does this anthology open with Chan’s translation of the “Explanation,” the index makes it easy to locate all 12 of the passages from Zhou’s writings that Master Zhu included.
Fung Yu-lan [Feng Youlan]. A History of Chinese Philosophy. Volume II: The Period of Classical Learning (from the Second Century B.C. to the Twentieth Century A.D.). Translated by Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1953.
- Rather dated but masterful overview of the history of Chinese thought. Like Chan’s Source Book, a must read for students of Asian philosophy. Section 1 of Chapter XI focuses on Zhou’s thought. The condensed A Short History of Chinese Philosophy (a single volume distillation of Fung’s larger two-volume work) is also informative.
Tu Wei-Ming and Mary Evelyn Tucker, eds. Confucian Spirituality. Volume Two. New York: The Crossroad Publishing Company, 2004.
- Part of the “World Spirituality” series, this collection of nearly 20 essays examines Confucian religious thought and practice from the Song era down to the present, covering the spread of Neo-Confucianism to Korea, Japan, Vietnam and its development into a truly a global tradition. Although Zhou Dunyi is not the focus of any specific essay, discussion of his thought and influence figure prominently in several pieces in the first part of the volume.
Tu Wei-Ming. Confucian Thought: Selfhood as Creative Transformation. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1985.
- Classic discussion of the spiritual dimensions of Confucian tradition (particularly the more Mencian Neo-Confucian dimensions) by its foremost proponent. While not explicitly devoted to Zhou, Tu’s discussion illuminates themes that run throughout the Song master’s work.
Wang, Robin. “Zhou Dunyi’s Diagram of the Supreme Ultimate Explained: A Construction of the Confucian Metaphysics.” Journal of the History of Ideas 66/3 (July 2005): 307-323.
- Highlights ways that Zhou’s thought traces a notion of gender complementarity in his depiction of human beings as arising from and embodying the original and sustaining energies of the cosmos (yin and yang). Human persons are its highest exemplification and as such are a prime phenomenon of this dynamic cosmic creation.
Zhou Dunyi. Zhou Dunyi ji (Collected Works of Zhou Dunyi). Edited by Chen Keming. Beijing: Zhonghua Shuju, 1990.
- Good contemporary Chinese edition of Zhou’s primary works.

Author Information

John Thompson
Email: john.thompson@cnu.edu
Christopher Newport University
U. S. A.

Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism

From the beginning to the end of his career Charles Hartshorne maintained that the idea that “God is love” was his guiding intuition in philosophy. This “intuition” presupposes both that there is a divine reality and that that reality answers to some positive description of being a loving God. This article focuses on the latter issue, namely, Hartshorne’s concept of God. Hartshorne’s views on the former issue are treated separately in another article, “Charles Hartshorne: Theistic and Anti-Theistic Arguments.” Hartshorne vigorously defended both propositions by clarifying what he meant by the phrase, “God is love,” by defending his views against a variety of objections, and generally by arguing that his version of theism (called “dipolar” or “neoclassical” theism) survives critical scrutiny better than its philosophical competitors.

Heavily influenced by Alfred North Whitehead, Hartshorne borrowed some of Whitehead’s technical vocabulary and he often promoted broadly Whiteheadian ideas. It is a mistake, however, to style him as Whitehead’s disciple for he departed from the older philosopher on a number of points, most notably (where this article is concerned), on questions surrounding the concept and the existence of God. In what follows we examine Hartshorne’s ideas about the concept of God. It is important, however, to appreciate that the formulation of a coherent theism is an integral part of the rational defense of theism. Hartshorne spent much of his career in a philosophical atmosphere in which the question was not so much “Does God exist?” as it was “Does ‘God’ name a coherent idea?” Philosophers from very diverse schools of thought—from Sartre to the Logical Positivists—rejected theism on the basis of alleged inconsistencies in the very idea of deity. Hartshorne himself remarked that there would be fewer atheists if theists had done a better job of making sense of the concept of God. Hartshorne’s response to this situation was to develop his dipolar or neoclassical concept of God. It can plausibly be claimed that Hartshorne accomplished at least two tasks: first, he introduced a sophisticated and religiously important form of theism heretofore unheard of or at least very poorly developed through philosophical argument and, second, he shifted the burden of proof onto those who claim that the concept of God is hopelessly muddled.

Divine Love and Divine Relativity
Existence and Actuality
Divine Perfection
Divine Power
Divine Knowledge
Panentheism
Conclusion
Suggestions for Further Reading

1. Divine Love and Divine Relativity

The only deity worthy of worship, Hartshorne believed, is one that could be described as “Love divine, all loves excelling,” as in the title of Charles Wesley’s hymn. Hartshorne did not identify himself as Christian nor did he consider himself a theologian. He argued, however, that Christian thinkers had an unfortunate tendency to allow what he considered to be warped ideas about absolute power and unchanging perfection to eclipse the central teaching of their faith concerning divine love. The parables of Jesus and the personal qualities he exhibits in the Gospels reflect, for the Christian, the image of a loving God. They portray one who not only acts for the benefit of the beloved but also sympathizes with others in such a way as to rejoice in their well-being and feel sorrow in their tragedies. These are the qualities of love that Hartshorne takes to be essential to it; at a bare minimum, love requires both the capacity to act for the welfare of others and to sympathize with their feelings. As the etymology of “compassion” suggests, it is “to suffer with” another in the desire to ameliorate the other’s suffering. If this sort of love is to be attributed to the divine being, then it must not only be possible for God to act for the welfare of the creatures but also to be affected by their weal and woe. In short, divine love entails the divine relativity: a social conception of God—the title of Hartshorne’s fourth book, published in 1948, now considered a classic in the philosophy of religion.

Divine relativity is precisely what much of traditional theology would not allow. As Aquinas said in Summa Theologica, God is really related to the creatures but the creatures have only a rational (that is, an imagined) relation to God (ST I, Q 13, a. 7). In short, God is impassible or unaffected by anything external. The only doctrine of divine love consistent with the doctrine of impassibility is one in which God promotes the welfare of the creatures, but is unaffected by what happens to them. On this view, divine love, unlike human forms of love, involves neither sympathy nor empathy. John Sanders demonstrates in The God Who Risks that Christian thinkers, from as early as Justin Martyr, realized that there is a tension between the belief in the goodness of God and the denial that God somehow shares in the joys and sorrows of the creatures. Anselm raised the question explicitly in chapter 8 of Proslogion: How can God be all-loving without any sympathetic responsiveness? Anselm answered by promoting a kind of theological behaviorism: we feel the effects of God’s goodness, but God feels nothing. On Hartshorne’s view, this doesn’t answer the question, it only reasserts divine impassibility.

Hartshorne affirms God’s love as involving both benevolence and feeling. Because God loves the creatures, what happens to them is felt also by God. As a loving parent suffers for a child who is ill or who has lost her way in life, so the God in whom Hartshorne believes, suffers through the misfortunes and the mischief of the creatures. He was fond of quoting one of the final statements from Whitehead’s Process and Reality that “God is the great companion—the fellow-sufferer who understands.” Hartshorne, following both Whitehead and Berdyaev, maintained that there can be tragedy, even for God. As Martha Nussbaum argues, tragedy can happen only to someone who cares enough about others to be disappointed by them or hurt by what happens to them. God, in Hartshorne’s view, is one who cares and who can therefore be disappointed or hurt by the actions of the creatures.

Hartshorne’s basic argument for divine relativity is stated throughout his writings. If God knows contingent states of affairs (for example, a woman listening to a bird singing at a particular time and place), then there must be contingency in God. For, if the object of knowledge can be other than it is (for example, the woman not listening to the bird), then the knowledge itself could be otherwise (for example, God knowing that the woman is not listening to the bird). The argument is not that God might have failed to be omniscient, but that the particular cognitive states of God could have been different. As Hartshorne noted, Aristotle inferred from this reasoning that God does not know the world; Spinoza, on the other hand, denied the contingency of the world—despite what seems to be the case, it is impossible, at that very moment, that the woman not be listening to the bird. Hartshorne concludes that one must choose among the mutually exclusive options: a God that is ignorant of the world, a world devoid of contingency, or the neoclassical view that there is contingency in God. What is ruled out by this argument is the Thomistic view that God knows contingent states of affairs but there is no contingency in God. (For different formalizations of this argument see Shields 1983 and Viney 2007/2012.)

Hartshorne’s basic argument for divine relativity is expressed in terms of the idea of God’s exhaustive knowledge but it could equally well be rephrased in terms of inexhaustible love, for love, like knowledge has it objects. Of course, these are not the only qualities that theists usually ascribe to God—there are also such qualities as eminent creativity, perfect power, and infinite wisdom. Hartshorne attempts to do justice to these ideas in formulating his neoclassical concept of God, but for him divine love remained paramount. This is significant for it highlights Hartshorne’s commitment to the principle that negation is parasitic upon positive attributions, that there are no merely negative facts (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). Many theologians, eager to affirm the transcendence of God, emphasize what cannot be known of God and argue that, in view of this ignorance, the most appropriate theological language is by way of negation (via negativa): God is not finite (infinite), not changeable (immutable), not affected by anything external (impassible), not contingent (necessary), not in time (non-temporal), and so forth. Hartshorne also emphasized what is not known of God and he did not deny that negations play an important role in religious discourse. In A Natural Theology for Our Time, he comments that our knowledge of the concrete divine reality is “negligibly small.” He argues, however, that as the sole or even primary approach to religious language, “the negative way” is a case of false modesty. Negative theologians are supposedly being deferential to God by stressing what cannot be known or said of God, but this masks the fact that they consider themselves privy to enough knowledge about the divine reality to know what cannot be attributed to it.

Hartshorne couples the accusation of false modesty with the charge that the negations used of deity by negative theologians almost invariably presuppose invidious contrasts: the finite is inferior to the infinite, the changeable to the unchangeable, the passible to the impassible, the temporal to the non-temporal, and so forth. Hartshorne argues that it is much too simplistic to label one side of an ultimate contrast as “better” and the other side “worse.” On the contrary, there are better and worse forms of each side of each contrast. For example, there are better and worse ways of being affected by others (passibility) and better and worse ways of being unaffected by others (impassibility): to identify too much with the suffering of others is damaging to one’s own well-being and may prevent one from helping others in need; to remain unaffected by the plight of others exhibits the character flaw of insensitivity. In Hartshorne’s view, theologians should not chase after negations if they wish to speak of one that is worthy of worship; rather, they should explore ways of attributing to God what is best in both sides of any particular contrast. For this reason, Hartshorne maintains that, to the extent that language is adequate to theological purposes, only a properly dipolar concept of deity can reflect the divine perfection: God is both finite and infinite, both passible and impassible, and so forth, but in different respects and in eminent ways.

In Analytic Theism, Hartshorne, and the Concept of God, Daniel Dombrowski notes that Hartshorne sought a theory of religious language that avoids two extremes: (1) language is wholly inadequate to describe God and (2) verbal formulae may capture God without doubt or obscurity. Hartshorne considered the formal abstractions of metaphysics to be the most nearly univocal language that is possible for deity, for they do not admit of degrees. For example, on Hartshorne’s view, God is, in different respects, necessary and contingent; we shall see, however, that this does not mean that God is more or less necessary or more or less contingent. Hartshorne calls the most nearly equivocal language about God “symbolic” because it presupposes particular times, places, and situations. Metaphors such as “shepherd,” “mother,” “father,” are examples. Analogical language holds a place between the abstract contraries of metaphysics and the concrete imagery of poetic imagination. Analogical language is a matter of degree, as when one says that love comes in many forms, but the eminent form of love belongs to God. In Beyond Humanism, Hartshorne claimed that psychical predicates such as memory, feeling, and volition admit of an infinite variability, extending beyond their specifically human forms to include the non-human animal world and to include what might exist in a superhuman form, such as deity. Hartshorne sometimes says that these sorts of predicates only apply literally to God and not the creatures. As Dombrowski avers, the most parsimonious interpretation of this “negative anthropology” is that Hartshorne is emphasizing that God alone has the supreme or eminent form of these qualities.

2. Existence and Actuality

To say that God exhibits both sides of a metaphysical contrast would be a logical contradiction unless there was a way of showing that the polar extremes apply to God in different respects. Søren Kierkegaard seemed to relish the paradox that “the eternal came to be in time.” Hartshorne did not mention Kierkegaard in this connection, but he apparently saw little advantage in this way of speaking. In The Divine Relativity, he complained that a theological paradox seems to be what a contradiction is when applied to God. In Hartshorne’s view, asserting contradictory things of God is not a sign of profundity but of confusion. Hartshorne’s proposal is to make a three-fold distinction of logical type, applicable to both God and the creatures, among existence (that a thing is), essence (what a thing is), and actuality (the particular state in which a thing is). To illustrate how this distinction can be applied to both God and the creatures, consider the case of a woman listening to a bird sing and of God knowing this fact. The woman exists, has the cognitive capacity to hear song birds, which is part of her essence (insofar as audition of is part of her natural endowment) and she is currently listening to a bird sing, which is her actual state. The same distinctions apply to God: God exists, has the essence of being all-knowing, and is in the actual state of knowing that the woman is listening to the bird sing.

The tripartite distinction of existence, essence, and actuality is one of logical type analogous to the logical type difference between universals and particulars. One may, for example, deduce that the woman exists if she is listening to the bird, but one may not deduce from the fact of her existence that she is listening to a bird. For this reason, Hartshorne maintains that existence (also essence) is abstract relative to actuality. Actuality is, so to speak, information rich, relative to existence (and essence). This is recognized in modern logic in the use of the existential quantifier which, by itself, gives no details about the existent object. Hartshorne’s three-fold distinction also allows one to make a distinction within God between what is necessary (could not be otherwise) and what is contingent (could be otherwise). It is conceivable that God exists necessarily and necessarily has the quality of being all-knowing, but the actual state of God’s knowing (for example, knowing that the woman is listening to a bird sing) might be contingent. Barring determinism, the woman’s listening to the bird is contingent: she might have been asleep, she might have been listening to a different bird, she might have been distracted, and so forth. If God is necessarily all-knowing, then God knows about the woman and her actual state, regardless of what it may be. Moreover, God’s actual state of knowing the woman as listening to the bird sing is as contingent as the fact that she is listening to the bird sing. The following diagram summarizes how the distinctions between the concrete and the abstract and the necessary and the contingent map onto Hartshorne’s three-fold distinction of existence, essence, and actuality as it applies to God and the creatures.

The three-fold distinction is often referred to by means of the simpler distinction between existence and actuality thereby anticipating the thesis of Hartshorne’s ontological argument that existence belongs to the nature or essence of God. One need not accept the ontological argument, however, to appreciate the importance of the distinction. David Tracy calls the distinction “Hartshorne’s Discovery” and Hartshorne himself said, “I rather hope to be remembered for this distinction.” Hartshorne notes that Aristotle anticipated the tripartite distinction of existence, essence, and actuality when he spoke of substance, essence, and accident. Hartshorne’s criticism of the Stagirite is that he considered substance as ontologically basic and thus could speak of accidental compounds. For Hartshorne, actuality is ontologically basic in the sense of being most concrete. In Philosophers Speak of God, Hartshorne writes, “It is actuality of accidents, not existence of substances that is prior” (1953, 72).

The distinction between existence and actuality is important because it allows, among other things, that there can be give-and-take relations between God and the creatures without reducing God to the status of a creature. Contrary to the ancient tradition of divine impassibility, God can be conceived as affected by the creatures. In the example, the woman listening to the bird brings it about that God knows that she is listening to the bird, although she does not bring it about that God is omniscient, for God would have been omniscient even had she never existed. In Summa Contra Gentiles, Aquinas argued that any contingency in God implies the possibility of God’s non-existence, thereby reducing God’s existence to the status of creaturely existence (SCG I, 16.2). In view of the difference between existence and actuality, the inference is invalid. God’s actual states can be contingent while God’s existence and essence remain necessary. Moreover, the essence of God must now be described not merely as necessary but as necessarily somehow actualized.

3. Divine Perfection

Hartshorne’s three-fold distinction allows one to appreciate the extent of his divergence from the dominant tradition in philosophical theology which he called “classical theism.” We have noted that classical theists, committed to the transcendence of God, were keen on the via negativa: God was placed on one side only of the pairs of contrasts, absolute/relative, infinite/finite, immutable/mutable, impassible/passible, necessary/contingent, and eternal/temporal. Hartshorne rejects this as a “monopolar prejudice,” an expression that highlights not only the “monopolar” aspect of classical theism but also the invidious character of the contrasts—the “prejudice”—as applied to God and the creatures. Hartshorne speaks instead of God’s dual transcendence. God transcends the creatures by being the supreme instance of both sides of the contrasts. The distinction between existence and actuality permits a logically coherent doctrine of dual transcendence by distinguishing different aspects of God. For example, God is immutable with respect to existence and essence, but mutable with respect to actuality. That is to say, God’s existence and essence are always the same, but God’s actual states are constantly being added to with the creative advance of the world. Or again, God is both necessary and contingent, but in different respects. God’s existence and essence are necessary (that is, could not be otherwise) whereas God’s actuality is contingent (that is, could be otherwise). The examples of divine mutability and contingency represent God’s flexibility in being able to respond to every possible change. It should now be clear why Hartshorne was making a serious point when he quipped that he believed in twice as much transcendence as was usually found in more traditional forms of theism.

From time to time, Hartshorne has been characterized as promoting a merely finite deity such as one finds in Mill’s essay Theism. Hartshorne’s commitment to the principle of dual transcendence entails that this is mistaken. Insofar as God has actual states, God is indeed finite. Furthermore, God can be nothing other than finite in this respect. God’s actuality is the realization of concrete value in the life of God and every realization of value, whether in God or in any other being, is finite in the sense that it excludes values that could have been achieved. For example, from an early age, Mozart’s father set his son on the trajectory of being a musician. Apart from this education and training, Mozart might have lived a very different life, as a lawyer, a military leader, or a peasant farmer. Each path would have led to a certain value achievement, but each, to a greater or lesser extent, excludes the others. In some fashion, God incorporates Mozart’s achievement into the divine life; as the values Mozart did not achieve were not part of his life, no more are they part of God’s. To say that God is not finite in this sense is to risk accepting a doctrine according to which God is merely infinite—that is to say, that God excludes whatever is of worth in the enjoyment of a finite realization of value. Hartshorne long maintained that the concept of the realization of all possible values is a meaningless ideal. God must, therefore, be finite, but not merely so. Dual transcendence means, among other things, that God must be infinite in receptive capacity; whatever comes to be, comes to be for God and becomes an everlasting component in God’s memory. There must also be in God an inexhaustible or infinite capacity to appreciate the creative advance. In addition, Hartshorne allowed that God is actually infinite in the sense that there was never a time when God did not exist and that God is omniscient with respect to this past life. Hartshorne was quick to add that this form of infinity is not the realization of all possible values, for the actually infinite life of God could have been different in as many ways (an infinite number) as the creative advance itself could have been different.

Classical theologians adopted an ideal of perfection as unchanging, often using the argument from Plato’s Republic that change for the better or worse implies an unchanging measure of perfection. The argument is that if something changes for the better then it is not yet perfect, but if it changes for the worse then it is no longer perfect. In either case, change implies imperfection. God, being perfect, must be devoid of change. This argument, however, begs the question against a dipolar conception of God like Hartshorne’s by assuming that there cannot be perfect forms of change. Hartshorne argues, on the contrary, that some forms of value—aesthetic qualities in particular—do not admit of a maximum. Just as it is impossible to speak of a greatest possible positive integer, so it may be impossible to speak of a greatest possible beauty. The fact that Mozart’s music achieved a new level of beauty does not mean that there was nothing left for Beethoven to do. Another analogy is interpersonal relationships. It is a good thing to be flexible in one’s responses to others. The ideal is not unchangeableness; it is, rather, adequate response to the needs of others. It is true that stability and reliability of character are desirable. But this means, in part, that the person can be relied upon to respond in ways appropriate to each situation, and responsiveness is a kind of change. The analogy is particularly appropriate in the divine case since there are always new creatures to which God must respond and hence there is no upper limit to the values associated with these relationships, for each is as unique as the individuals with whom God is related.

As Hartshorne distinguished existence and actuality, so he distinguished different ways in which God is perfect. Taking a clue from the work of Gustav Fechner, Hartshorne noticed an ambiguity in the concept of perfection. If one is perfect, then one is unsurpassable, but by what or by whom is one unsurpassable? The obvious answer is “by others.” This leaves open the possibility that one may surpass oneself. Thus, there is a distinction between (a) being unsurpassable by all others including self and (b) being unsurpassable by all others excluding self.” In Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism, Hartshorne labels these two ideas respectively A-perfection (for absolute perfection) and R-perfection (for relative perfection). God is A-perfect with respect to existence and essence and R-perfect with respect to actuality. Hartshorne agrees with more traditional theists who spoke of God as infinite, immutable, impassible, necessary, and eternal, for this is God’s A-perfection. Hartshorne quickly adds, however, that God is not in all respects infinite, immutable, impassible, necessary, and eternal. To use our previous example, if aesthetic values exhibit an unlimited possibility of increase, then God’s appreciation of beauty may—indeed must—exhibit this possibility. Again, Beethoven’s music introduces new forms of beauty that did not exist prior to his creative life. Hartshorne would also say that God, in enjoying the changing beauty of the world, is also the supremely beautiful object of contemplation, a point to which we shall return in the discussion of panentheism. Hartshorne summarized these ideas about divine perfection in The Divine Relativity when he spoke of God as “the self-surpassing surpasser of all.”

4. Divine Power

Theologians have often commented on how difficult it is to define “omnipotence.” Most of those who have thought about this, Hartshorne included, conclude that René Descartes was wrong, in his letter to Mersenne (May 27, 1630), to suppose that God could bring about logically inconsistent states of affairs. Aquinas, for example, in Summa Contra Gentiles denied that God could draw a circle with unequal radii, for this involves a logical inconsistency: one must fix the angle of the compass in order to guarantee that the arc becomes a circle, but one must at the same time not fix the angle, allowing it to become wider or smaller, in order to make the radii unequal (SCG II, 25.14). Aquinas also denied that God could change the past once it has occurred. In Summa Theologica, Aquinas says that not even God can restore virginity to someone who has lost it (ST I, Q 25, a. 4, reply to Obj. 3). Finally, Aquinas denied that God can do what is contrary to God’s nature, such as doing an unloving deed (ST I, Q 25, art. 3, Reply to Obj. 2). On each of these points, Hartshorne agrees.

Beyond these agreements, Hartshorne attributes both more power and less power to God than did the Angelic Doctor. For Aquinas, God can act but not be acted upon by anything external—this is the doctrine of impassibility. As we have seen, Hartshorne argues that God has the power to be acted upon by the creatures and to respond to them. In this sense, Hartshorne attributes more power to God than does Aquinas. On the other hand, Aquinas apparently believed that God can unilaterally bring about some states of affairs in which more than one agent makes decisions. For Aquinas, God is called omnipotent because everything that does not imply a contradiction in terms is within God’s power to accomplish (ST I, Q 25, a. 3). Hartshorne rejects this claim and holds instead that any state of affairs in which more than one agent makes decisions cannot be conceived as the product of one agent, even if that agent is God. Suppose Ruth loves Naomi and Naomi loves Ruth—their mutual love can be explained only by referring to the activity of two persons, Ruth and Naomi. The logic of the situation does not change if one of the agents is God. The state of affairs described by God loving Ruth and Ruth loving God can only be explained by the activity of both God and Ruth, and not by God alone. Of course, if God is all-loving, then it is impossible that Ruth (an actual person) not be loved by God; but this does not change the fact that two agents—God and Ruth—are required to create the situation of their mutual love. If this is correct, then it is false that God, acting alone, can bring about any state of affairs in which more than one agent is making decisions. A corollary is that it is false that God can bring about any state of affairs the description of which is logically consistent—for there is nothing logically inconsistent about two individuals loving each other.

Classical theists, Aquinas in particular, are not without responses to Hartshorne’s reasoning. Aquinas made two claims relevant to Hartshorne’s argument. First, he maintained that the self-same result could be wholly attributed to two different causes; perhaps Ruth’s loving God can be wholly attributed to Ruth and wholly attributed to God. In Summa Contra Gentiles, Aquinas’ example is that the music of a flute is wholly attributable to the instrument and to the musician (SCG III, Pt. 1, 70.8). Of course, the music is manifestly not attributable to either the instrument or the musician singly; both are required, which supports Hartshorne’s claim. It is relevant to note that it is illicit to distribute “wholly” through a conjunction. There is no valid inference from “X is wholly the result of (A and B)” to “X is wholly the result of A and X is wholly the result of B.” The second thing that Aquinas says that might undermine Hartshorne’s argument is his claim that God has the power to bring about some events necessarily and to bring about other events contingently (ST I, Q 19, a. 8). In this way, one might make head-way in making sense of the idea that God creates a person’s decision while yet preserving the contingency (an element of freedom) of the decision. Again, however, Hartshorne demurs. It makes sense to say that one can be the cause of a contingent event—every roll of the dice is proof of that. It is much less clear that it makes sense to say that one can guarantee the outcome of a contingent event. If one loads the dice in such a way that a particular number must appear (say, seven), then the outcome is not contingent; only if the dice are not loaded is the outcome truly contingent. Again, one should take note of an illicit distribution, but this time it is the problem of distributing “causes” or “guarantees” over a disjunction. There is no valid inference from “X causes (A or B or C)” to “X causes A or X causes B or X causes C.”

Hartshorne’s most controversial departure from classical theism is his denial of creation ex nihilo. Indeed, the argument just given that some states of affairs require multiple decision makers is itself an argument against ex nihilo creation, at least in its classic form. God was said to create the universe, which includes the decisions that creatures make, in one non-temporal and unilateral act. Hartshorne’s argument entails that no universe with multiple decision makers can be created in its entirety by God alone. Aquinas notwithstanding, the making of decisions is a paradigm of creative activity, for something is brought into existence if only the decision itself. For this reason, Hartshorne’s example of multiple decision makers is also an example of multiple creators. Hartshorne saw in Jules Lequyer’s statement that “God created me creator of myself” an anticipation of his own views on divine creativity. A hallmark of Hartshorne’s neoclassical theism is that the universe is a joint creative product of (a) the lesser creators that are the creatures, localized in space and time, and (b) the eminent creator which is God whose influence extends to every creature that ever has or that ever will exist.

Hartshorne defends a metaphysical view that posits creativity as a transcendental, applicable to both God and the creatures. Creativity, in such a metaphysic, is never “from nothing” but is relational, requiring a pre-existent universe (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). It follows that there can be no such thing as God without a universe or, for that matter, a universe without God. A common objection to this view is that it portrays God as dependent upon the universe. Hartshorne considers the objection to be flawed in two ways. First, it assumes an invidious contrast between independence and dependence. We have seen that Hartshorne is at pains to instruct philosophers and theologians to be wary of devaluing dependence (and, more generally, to be cautious of simplistic valuations of metaphysical contrasts). Second, the objection is subtly ambiguous. If Hartshorne is correct, then God and the universe are indeed necessary to each other. The proviso, however, is that no particular set of creatures (that is, no particular universe) is necessary to God. An analogy that Hartshorne uses in Creative Synthesis is of a mathematical set that necessarily has numbers, but the numbers that it has are not necessary. God’s actual states, being contingent, are dependent upon interaction with the creatures; God’s existence, on the other hand, is necessary, for it depends upon no particular creatures or groups of creatures. It should also be noted that Hartshorne preserves the distinction between God and the creatures: the divine being meets with no universe that it did not have a hand in co-creating whereas the creatures, because they begin to exist, are born into a universe that they had no part in making. Of course, once the creature exists, it becomes a lesser, co-creator, with God.

In The Divine Relativity and elsewhere, Hartshorne distinguishes two forms of power involving direct and indirect causation. Direct causal influence occurs when one entity—Hartshorne’s name for the metaphysically basic entities is “dynamic singulars”—acts on another without an intermediary as when a present experience acts upon an immediately subsequent experience in the life of a single individual; one’s memory of the preceding moment, for example, is the feeling of one experience acting on its successor in direct fashion. Hartshorne avers that a similar direct action occurs between parts of the nervous system and between the nervous system and the body. Indirect causal influence, on Hartshorne’s account, occurs when one body acts upon another body, which often involves modifying the inter-bodily environment in some way, such as speaking, which causes air to move and sound waves are heard by another person. Some cases of indirect causal action are examples of “brute force” whereby one body moves another body from one place to another. Barring telepathy, cases of one person acting on another are always indirect. On the other hand, Hartshorne maintains that God’s action on dynamic singulars is never indirect. Because each entity retains its own power of creative experiencing, this direct causal influence is not deterministic. Hartshorne, following Whitehead (who was following the later Plato), refers to this mode of influence as “divine persuasion” which is, in effect, the active side of divine love. God acts as a supreme ideal, urging each dynamic singular to achieve an intensity of experience appropriate to its level of complexity. Thus, in Creative Experiencing Hartshorne says, “It is the [divine] love that explains the [divine] power, not vice versa.”

Some philosophers accept Hartshorne’s critique of the traditional concept of omnipotence but argue that the neoclassical account of divine power does not endow God with the highest degree of power conceivable. One may concede that “divine persuasion” is the most admirable form of power, but insist nevertheless that God should also be conceived as having the ability to thwart human decisions by preventing them from being acted upon or by preventing their natural consequences from occurring. In Divine Power in Process Theism, David Basinger notes that a parent can force an unruly child to go to bed by physically putting the child there. If God is unable to accomplish such a feat then, Basinger argues, God does not have the highest degree of power, for the parent is able to do what God cannot. In response one may note that Hartshorne’s metaphysical principles allow that God has the ability to persuade the child to get into bed or even to persuade the parent to force the child into bed. It is contrary to Hartshorne’s thinking, however, to say that God has a body with a location within the cosmos. This is also contrary to classical theism (also Basinger’s “free will theism”)—the idea that Jesus was God embodied involves metaphysical issues which Basinger’s critique does not presuppose. In view of these qualifications, Basinger’s objection seems to be that if God is to be conceived as having the highest degree of power, God must be able to accomplish miraculously what the parent accomplishes without a miracle through the use of his or her body.

Hartshorne responded to Basinger’s critique in a letter (dated August 4, 1988) and said, among other things, that he doubted that he ever claimed that miracles never occur. He was disinclined to believe that miracles have in fact occurred on grounds similar to those offered by Hume (also Montaigne): probabilities favor deceit or error over genuine miracles. Hartshorne attributed the laws of nature to God’s influence over all dynamic singulars (see the article, “Charles Hartshorne on Theistic and Anti-theistic Arguments: Global Argument”) and said that he doubted our wisdom to judge how far the value of such laws “justifies the absence of notable divine intervention.” Doubting, however, the quality of evidence for miracles is different from doubting the possibility of miracles. Basinger replied to Hartshorne (August 24, 1988) that he wasn’t “quite sure” what it could mean in neoclassical metaphysics to suppose that miracles could occur. This is a fair question, especially in light of Hartshorne’s denial that God acts indirectly. On the other hand, it is fair to ask for an account of divine power that is not merely ad hoc but flows naturally from general metaphysical principles such as Hartshorne was at pains to give. With the possible exception of Descartes’ concept of omnipotence, every account of divine power includes propositions of the form “God cannot X.” The force of the “cannot” may be in the logical impossibility of the act named (for example, making a circle with unequal radii), in the nature of God (for example, God cannot intend evil), in the nature of that over which divine power is exercised (for example, God cannot create a creature’s creative act), or in the particular relations that God has with the creatures (for example, God cannot act indirectly). It is a legitimate question what it means to speak of attributing the highest degree of power to God apart from a system of metaphysical principles. It is not that a particular metaphysic is a final court of appeal for a concept of divine power; on the other hand, an appeal to divine power may be no more than a deus ex machina apart from a well-articulated metaphysic.

5. Divine Knowledge

One of the lessons to be learned from debates about divine power is that one’s ideas about God have implications for one’s ideas about the world and vice versa. To assume that God can bring about any logically possible state of affairs presupposes that all states of affairs are such that, in principle, they require only a single being to bring them about. That presupposition, however, begs the question against a world-view like Hartshorne’s in which reality has a social structure. In such a world, it is no limit on God if God cannot bring about every logically possible state of affairs. There is an analogous lesson where divine knowledge is concerned. If reality is continually in-the-making, as Hartshorne maintains, then there is a fundamental asymmetry between past and future. The past is fully determinate and the future is the realm of the partially indeterminate. If God is all-knowing, then God must know the future for what it is, as partially indeterminate. If one raises the objection that such a deity is not omniscient because the future is partially hidden from it, one has failed to cross the pons asinorum of the debate. It is a defect in divine knowledge not to know a fully determinate future only if there is a fully determinate future to be known. The assumption of a fully determinate future is evident in the use that Aquinas makes of the analogy made famous by Boethius: as each point on the circumference of a circle is equidistant from the center, so God is equally knowledgeable of every moment of time (SCG I, 66.7; see also Boethius, Consolation of Philosophy, Bk 4, Pr. 6). As Hartshorne noted, however, the analogy assumes that time can be represented as a completed whole, whereas time may be more like an endless line whose points are added from moment to moment.

Hartshorne’s criticism of the circle analogy was anticipated by late medieval philosophers like John Duns Scotus (Ordinatio I, d. 39, q. 1-5) and Luis de Molina (Condordia IV, d. 49.18). The questions raised by the circle analogy concern not only the nature of time, but also the nature of God. Traditional theists, as we have seen, were reluctant to attribute any passive potency to God; they thought that the perfection of the divine being required that God be immutable and impassible. If, however, God is not affected by anything external, then how is it that God knows the world? Aquinas answered that the cognitive relation in God is the reverse of what it is for humans. We know the world because it affects us, but God knows the world because God is its creator. The Thomistic solution may preserve divine impassibility but at the expense of making human freedom problematic. We have already discussed this problem in the previous section. There was, however, another very imaginative solution to the “mechanics of omniscience” given by Molina. He argued that, prior to creating the world, God has knowledge of what any possible free creature would do in any particular circumstance. Using this “middle knowledge” in combination with the knowledge of what creatures God has in fact chosen to create, God is able to know what every free creature will do in the circumstances where they have been placed.

New life was breathed into Molinism by analytic philosophers of religion in the late twentieth century. For his part, Hartshorne never directly addressed Molina’s theory. It is easy enough, however, to reconstruct a Hartshornean response to Molinism. Above all, it is important to appreciate that, of necessity, the logical subjects of God’s middle knowledge are possible persons. God’s knowledge of what would be the case for any free creature is pre-volitional; that is to say, God knows, prior to creating, what any creature, whether it is eventually created or not, would do under any given circumstance. Middle knowledge cannot serve to guide God’s providential decisions about which world to create if it depends upon which world God creates. For this reason, the usual characterization of middle knowledge as “counter-factuals of freedom” is seriously misleading. Prior to God’s decision to create a world, there are no creatures and, hence, no fact of the matter about any actual creature. There are only possible creatures. Hartshorne denied the existence of possible non-actual individuals. In Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism he wrote, “There is an unutilized possibility of individuals, but not an individuality of unutilized possibility.” (See also, “Charles’s Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics.”) Given these views, it is clear that Hartshorne would reject Molinism.

There is a hint of irony in claiming to know what Hartshorne would say about middle knowledge. Does this not presuppose a kind of middle knowledge of Hartshorne? In view of what was just said about the logical subjects of middle knowledge, the answer to this question should be obvious. Hartshorne was not a possible person; he was a real person whose views on various philosophical topics were clearly stated. The argument is this: Molinism entails belief in possible persons; Hartshorne denied the existence of possible persons; therefore, Hartshorne would deny Molinism. This argument points to one of the most puzzling features of Molinism, to wit, that middle knowledge is not grounded in fact. Hartshorne’s developmental and cumulative view of process permits speculation about what a given actual person would or might do under various sets of circumstances. These “would be” and “might be” statements are grounded in the world-historical process itself, including a person’s character as so far formed or (as in Hartshorne’s case) as it was formed. Hartshorne made precisely this point in his response to Robert Kane in the Library of Living Philosophers volume devoted to Hartshorne’s work. For Hartshorne, God’s knowledge of the world is similar to our knowledge in that it requires a real relation from the object of knowledge to the knower. The difference, in God’s case, is that divine knowledge is eminent—God perfectly knows the extent to which the future is open or closed at any particular juncture of the creative advance.

A subtle objection to Hartshorne’s theory of omniscience is that it represents God as ignorant of certain truths. To be sure, the neoclassical God perfectly knows the past—what did or did not happen—but does God, as so conceived, know everything that will or will not happen? Consider a person, P, at time T1 as yet undecided about a difficult choice: will P choose B or not-B? Let us suppose that at T2 the person decides B. On Hartshorne’s account, God knows at T2 that P chooses B, but God does not know at T1 that P will choose B. The argument can be further refined: an omniscient being knows all truths; at T1, either “P will choose B” or “P will choose not-B” is true; the neoclassical God does not know at T1 which of the statements is true; therefore, this God is not omniscient.

Hartshorne’s initial response to this objection, in a 1939 article, was to argue, in effect, that there are three truth values: true, false, and indeterminate. According to this view—which may have been Aristotle’s—future tense statements have an indeterminate truth value. Hartshorne was unhappy with this idea because it requires abandoning the law of excluded middle; if p concerns a future event, then “p or not-p” is best construed as indeterminate rather than (as in traditional logic) a tautology. In Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism, Hartshorne hit upon a different response to the argument, one which he would develop more fully in an article in Mind in 1965 (reprinted in Creative Experiencing). Hartshorne’s mature position was to argue that “P will choose B” and “P will choose not-B” are best construed as contraries rather than contradictories. The strict contradictory of “P will choose B” is “P may not choose B” and the strict contradictory of “P will not choose B” is “P may choose B.” The statements forms in the triad—“P will choose B,” “P will not choose B” and “P may or may not choose B”—are mutually exclusive: if one is true the other two are false. In this way, Hartshorne preserves the law of excluded middle as to truth values while allowing for the openness of the future.

Since, on Hartshorne’s view, “will” and “will not” statements are contraries, it is incorrect to represent them in the sentential meta-language as, respectively, p and not-p. Rather, “X will occur” and “X will not occur” should be represented as p and q, where ~ (p & q) (that is, “not-(p and q)”). A similar mapping of object language expressions onto sentential meta-language is needed in other domains as when one represents the pairs of contraries, “commands X” vs. “forbids X” or “legally requires X” vs. “legally requires not-X”: the remaining alternative in each case, respectively, is “makes no command with respect to X” and “there is no legal requirement with respect to X.” The metaphysical underpinning of Hartshorne’s proposed semantics of future tense statements is his indeterminism, according to which past causal conditions require (X will occur), exclude (X will not occur), or permit (X may or may not occur) various effects in the future.

Anticipating an objection, Hartshorne admits that it seems paradoxical to say that “X will occur,” as a prediction, is false even when X in fact occurs. Hartshorne replies that the “paradox” may be no more problematic than the familiar fact that a false scientific law can be verified (or corroborated). This is simply one more instance of the so-called paradox of material implication. We accept that “if p then q” is true when p is false, even if this seems counter-intuitive. The paradox dissolves upon the realization that any other truth functional definition of the conditional besides the standard one—“if p then q” is equivalent by definition to “not-p or q”—yields manifestly invalid inferences. Hartshorne takes a clue from Popper and says that the decisive operation where “will be” statements are concerned is falsification. “X will occur” is shown to be false when X does not occur, but it is not shown to have been true when X occurs. Hartshorne’s view requires that, in the strictest philosophical sense, “will be” statements are disguised “must be” statements. Intuitions among competent speakers of the language differ on this point so it is reasonable not to expect the issue to be decided by ordinary language. When Scrooge, in Dickens’ A Christmas Carol, asks the Ghost of Christmas Future whether he is seeing the shadows of the things that “will be” or the shadows of the things that “may be only,” he is expressing in a precise way Hartshorne’s analysis of future tense statements. If the shadows are of the things that “will be,” then all hope is lost, but if they are the shadows of the things that “may be only” then Scrooge can change his ways and make for himself a different future.

Our discussion to this point has followed philosophical orthodoxy by focusing on whether God knows the truth values of propositions. For Hartshorne, however, this question is secondary, for there is more to knowledge than knowledge that a proposition is true. In The Principles of Psychology, William James, following John Grote distinguished, “knowledge of acquaintance” and “knowledge-about,” a distinction later made famous by Bertrand Russell who spoke of “knowledge by acquaintance” and “knowledge by description.” To have information about something or someone is not the same as having first-hand awareness of them. The two sorts of knowledge are related as more abstract to more concrete. It is one thing to read about a battle, quite another to have experienced it for oneself. Moreover, as a general rule, the more abstract the knowledge, the more emotionally detached it can be. The basic form of knowledge that Hartshorne attributes to deity is direct acquaintance through the affective bonds of feeling; Hartshorne adopts Whitehead’s term “prehension” for the most concrete facts of relatedness among dynamic singulars. If God’s knowledge is prehensive, it is perhaps easier to understand why Hartshorne resists the idea that God knows the future as determinate: no one is acquainted with the future; at best one has knowledge of acquaintance of the future as an array of tendencies towards actualization or as possibilities entertained. Moreover, conceiving God’s relations with the creatures as prehensive places emphasis on the affective dimension of divine knowing. God’s knowing, as feelings of the feelings of others can then be conceived as a form of caring.

Hartshorne’s theory posits God’s perfect knowledge of the future as relatively indeterminate and of the past as determinate. Yet, the past, even if it is determinate as Hartshorne claims, is no longer. Does this mean that God also lacks knowledge of acquaintance with the past? Hartshorne answers in the negative and it is important to understand his reasons. A creature, having specific spatio-temporal location, has acquaintance with at most a vanishingly small segment of events in space and time, and even that knowledge is shot through with fallibility. Most of our knowledge of the past is through inference and by description. We know by acquaintance the past we have lived, but most of our knowledge of the past is about the past. God’s knowledge is both quantitatively and qualitatively different. Divine experience encompasses everything that has ever come to pass. As a localized individual has acquaintance with its past, God, in an analogous fashion, has acquaintance with all that is past. Divine knowledge, moreover, not only knows all of the past but knows it with perfect adequacy. God’s is the eminent form of prehension. On Hartshorne’s principles, the distant past must be as vivid for God as the recent past. In other words, the past does not “fade” for God. The difference, for God, between distant past events and recent ones is in the knowledge that recent events were preceded by the distant ones whereas there was a time when the recent events were, at best, outlines of what could be relative to distant past events.

The extent of God’s knowledge of the past is a point of contention between Whitehead (or Whiteheadians) and Hartshorne. In the concluding lines of Process and Reality, Whitehead speaks of how creaturely achievements, though transient, are everlastingly remembered by God, making them objectively immortal. The “unfading importance of our immediate actions” are said to “perish and yet live for evermore.” In the Library of Living Philosophers volume on Hartshorne, Lewis Ford interprets Whitehead to mean that each actual occasion (Hartshorne’s dynamic singulars) undergoes a two stage process, its coming-to-be (during which it is a subject of experience) and its objectification (in which it ceases to be a subject of experience) in the coming-to-be of subsequent occasions. According to Ford, it was Whitehead’s “momentous discovery” in metaphysics that the subject/object distinction is a difference in temporal modality; that is to say, an occasion’s status in the present, as it comes to be, is to be a subject, but as past it is an object. Hartshorne agrees with much of this analysis, but he objects to Whitehead’s metaphor of perishing. Hartshorne contends that the objects that are prehended by subsequent occasions are past subjects. If the being of an actual entity is constituted by its becoming, as Whitehead says (and Hartshorne agrees), then God’s prehension of an occasion is precisely God’s feeling of that occasion’s feelings. What exists everlastingly in the divine memory is not merely a knowledge that a dynamic singular felt in a particular way, but an acquaintance with how it felt. Hartshorne likens God’s memory of a person’s experiences to the person’s own vivid recollection of their past experiences.

6. Panentheism

A distinctive feature of Hartshorne’s theism, and one that sets it apart from Whitehead’s theism, is that God includes the universe in a way that bears a distant analogy with the way that a person includes his or her body. Until 1941 Hartshorne spoke of a “new pantheism,” but afterwards he spoke of panentheism, meaning that all (pan) is in (en) God (theos). Hartshorne cited Plato’s World-Soul analogy in some of the later dialogues as an anticipation of panentheism. Hartshorne, however, divests the doctrine of any vestige of mind-body dualism. God is not an immaterial entity haunting the universe; rather, as Hartshorne says in Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes, God is “the individual integrity of ‘the world,’ which otherwise is just the myriad creatures.” Hartshorne relies on modern cell theory for an analogy which, of course, was unavailable to Plato. Every localized dynamic singular is, as it were, a cell, in the body of God. An important disanalogy is that the universe, unlike a body within the universe, has no environment external to itself. Thus, in the divine case, the “body” of God and the “environment” in which God operates are one and the same. Hartshorne expresses this idea by saying that God’s “environment” is wholly internal. He adds that the disanalogy explains why there are no specialized organs—such as liver, heart, and brain—in the divine body as there must be in a localized body. Specialized organs allow a localized body to monitor itself in its relation to its environment, but there is no other environment for God to negotiate except the universe. Dombrowski rightly says that, for Hartshorne, it is as true to say that the cosmos is ensouled as to say that God is embodied (Dombrowski 1996, 86).

Hartshorne also used analogies of persons related to persons as symbolic language for the relationship between God and the creatures. He was deeply critical, however, of the male bias of traditional theology. The few female metaphors used for God in the Bible, for example, were overshadowed by the dominance of male images—Lord of Hosts, Father, King—which reinforced patriarchal attitudes. Hartshorne considered himself a feminist. Sometime in the late 1970s or early 1980s, he was alerted to the problem of sexism in language and so he began using inclusive language as one can see in Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes and elsewhere. He said that, in retrospect, it would have been better had his early book Man’s Vision of God been titled Our Vision of God. (Auxier and Davies 2001, 159). Hartshorne’s feminism is also apparent in a variation he gives to panentheism. He argued that the relationship between mother and fetus is decidedly more intimate than the relation between father and fetus. Thus, for some purposes, the analogy of a pregnant mother for the relation between God and the creatures is preferable to any male counterpart. Of course, the pregnancy analogy, like all symbolic language for deity, has a restricted use. Nevertheless, re-imagining God as a woman is a useful reminder of the male bias of traditional theology and it helps to highlight aspects of the God/World relationship that were obscured by that bias.

Analogies like World-Soul, person-cell, or pregnancy, are at best distant approximations for the relationship of God to the world. As metaphors they are literally false, but they are aids in understanding what Hartshorne has in mind when he says that God includes the world. Hartshorne’s argument for panentheism is disarmingly simple: If God is the greatest conceivable reality, then God must include all that is valuable in the universe. Otherwise, there would be a reality greater than God, namely, the universe-plus-God. Could God include what is valuable in the universe without including the universe? Hartshorne does not think so. Each dynamic singular that comes to be is not simply an additional fact; it is, by virtue of Hartshorne’s panexperientialist psychicalism also a value-achievement, and that value-achievement is greater in more complex organisms. We have previously used the examples of Mozart and Beethoven as introducing new values into the universe, but other examples are legion. The sum total of value in the universe, which is inseparable from the dynamic singulars that comprise it, is ever increasing according to Hartshorne’s process-relational metaphysic. It must therefore be included within God if God is to be conceived as the reality than which none is greater.

Norris Clarke says that medieval philosophers anticipated Hartshorne’s argument and replied to it (Clarke 1990, 108). They said that the reality described by “God plus the universe” involves more beings in a quantitative sense, but not greater perfection of being in a qualitative sense. More precisely, says Clarke, “God plus the universe” means that there are more sharers in being. All value is in God, and the creatures merely share or participate in that value. By way of analogy, Clarke says that a mathematician may impart her knowledge to her students. Once the students learn what the teacher has to teach there is not more knowledge in the class, there is only more of those sharing in the knowledge. A different analogy, however, could be used to bring out the distinctiveness of Hartshorne’s view. A music teacher may provide her class with the basics of theory and composition, but the students can create new musical pieces, each with a value of its own. In this example, there are not simply more sharers of being, but more creators of value. The medieval response that Clarke gives is defective, on Hartshorne’s reckoning, at precisely the point that process-relational theology departs from classical theism: the universe is not simply a product of divine creativity but of multiple creative agents. Classical theism had the unhappy consequence of divesting the creatures of any value that is their own, except for what is on loan from God. The sum-total value or perfection of existence is the same whether or not the creatures exist. For this reason, Hartshorne considered his panentheism to give a better account than classical theism of what it means to serve God. If the value in a creature is wholly borrowed from God, then the individual can offer God nothing that did not already belong to God by natural endowment. For Hartshorne, on the other hand, the creatures may be imperfect, but they are not mere conduits for values that God already possesses. On the contrary, their value contributes to that of God—hence, Hartshorne’s expression, “contributionism.”

A question that Hartshorne raised in Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism and that he discussed with E. S. Brightman in their correspondence was whether it is possible for God to include individuals that hold erroneous beliefs without also holding those beliefs. Put somewhat differently, if different individuals hold contradictory beliefs and God “includes” those individuals and their beliefs, does God hold contradictory beliefs? Similar puzzles can be raised about God’s inclusion of individuals who commit terrible crimes—is the evil of the criminal deed a property of God? Or again, can God include creatures who are anxious about their death without also being anxious about death? Hartshorne replies that the logic of parts and wholes is such that they do not necessarily share properties—for example, a sand dune is not the size of a grain of sand even though it is made of grains of sand. Each part of the universe, Hartshorne holds, is a dynamic singular with an activity of its own that is not simply the activity of the universe as a whole (this is another way of expressing indeterminism). By parity of reasoning, these centers of individual activity, or the organisms of which they are parts, can have properties (such as false beliefs, evil deeds, or anxiety about death) that are not shared by the whole. A person can remember formerly holding a false belief or doing something wrong; God, by analogous extension, can prehend—that is, make part of the divine life—the errors and sins of the creatures without thereby being in error or sinning. It is important to add that while Hartshorne denies that God is the author of creaturely lack of wisdom and virtue, God nevertheless suffers their negative effects. In Creativity in American Philosophy, Hartshorne maintains that God feels how others feel without feeling as they feel (1984, 199).

Two advantages of panentheism, as Hartshorne argues for it, are that it provides a ready argument in support of monotheism and it addresses the empiricist challenge of how to identify the referent of the word God. If God is an all-inclusive reality, then there can be only one God because there can be only one all-inclusive reality. In “Synthesis as Polydyadic Inclusion,” Hartshorne defines inclusion in these terms: if X includes Y, then X + Y = X (1976, 247). If X denotes God and Y denotes the universe, then God, plus the universe is God. The argument that there could not be two all-inclusive deities is this: suppose W and X are two all-inclusive deities; this means that each must include the other. That is to say, W + X = X and W + X = W, but in that case, W = X. As for the empiricist challenge, the conditions for the identification of the panentheistic God are not the same as would be required to identify a localized being. Individuals within the cosmos occupy a tiny portion of the universe for a vanishingly brief period. Their influence is felt locally but not universally. God, on the other hand, is affected by all and affects all. As Hartshorne says, God is the one individual with strictly universal functions (1948, 31; 1967, 76). From this, he infers that God is the one individual identifiable, or picked out, by concepts alone. Other individuals have properties that might have been had by others (for example, Obama was the Democratic candidate for President in 2008, but he need not have been) and the properties they actually have might have been different (for example, Hillary Clinton was born in Chicago, but she could have been born elsewhere). The formal properties of God as all inclusive are unique to God: no other individual has universal functions. One might search the earth for Obama or Clinton, but it would be profoundly misguided to search the earth, or the cosmos, for God. The description of God in the book of Acts is applicable to Hartshorne’s panentheism: God is the one “in whom we live, move, and have our being.”

7. Conclusion

The amount of energy that Hartshorne devoted to questions surrounding the nature and existence of God might lead one to classify him as a theologian. Yet, his defense of dipolar theism presupposes no sectarian dogma, makes no appeals to “revealed” truths or books, and privileges no mystical experience. There can be no question that he was first and foremost—as he himself emphasized—a philosopher. Various ideas about deity that he defended, most notably his critique of divine immutability and impassibility, have been widely influential although few would be willing to call themselves Hartshorneans. A case in point is the late William P. Alston who had been a student in Hartshorne’s class and who, late in his career, attempted to find a mediating position between Hartshorne and Aquinas. Another example of Hartshorne’s influence is that he spoke explicitly of “the openness of God” fully thirty years before that expression was adopted by a group of evangelical Christians to describe a deity open to creaturely influence and that faces a relatively open future. Some of the major figures in that movement—William Hasker, Gregory Boyd, and Richard Rice—acknowledge a debt to Hartshorne’s arguments for conceiving God in relational terms even as they distance themselves from the heterodox elements of his thinking. One may also mention Hartshorne as a pioneer who contributed to the recent widespread interest among philosophers of religion in panentheism. Carol Christ, long at the forefront of feminist theology, sees in Hartshorne’s work philosophically sophisticated ways of “re-imagining the divine in the world.”

Although he was a philosopher, Hartshorne’s work has attracted the attention of theologians. In 1973, a volume devoted to his thought was published in a series titled, “Makers of the Modern Theological Mind.” Many theologians, such as Schubert Ogden (who studied with Hartshorne at Chicago), Marjorie Suchocki, Sheila Devaney, Anna Case-Winters, and Theodore Walker, Jr., have critically appropriated Hartshorne’s philosophical theology. John B. Cobb Jr. (who also studied with Hartshorne at Chicago), once commented that it is often the case that a philosopher that gains a following among theologians is regarded with suspicion by other philosophers. This tendency may be less prominent since the resurgence of interest in philosophy of religion in the closing decades of the twentieth century. Of course, Hartshorne was active throughout the century, vigorously defending the rationality of dipolar theism in the heyday of the Vienna Circle. At a time when religious discourse was widely regarded as nonsensical, Hartshorne met and challenged the positivists on their own terms. It is fair to say that Hartshorne was influenced by his Chicago colleague Rudolf Carnap in his insistence on high standards of logical rigor. Carnap was, in turn, constructively engaged with Hartshorne’s work. Carnap was reportedly intrigued by Hartshorne’s formal reduction to absurdity disproof of the coherence of classical attributes of deity as developed in The Divine Relativity; he worked with Hartshorne closely on the technical appendix to Chapter II on “Relativity and Logical Entailment” in The Divine Relativity.

Hartshorne’s development of a philosophical theology according to which God is transcendent yet inseparable from temporal processes is arguably one of his lasting achievements. His defense of divine relativity may well be the single most important factor in dissolving the near consensus that once prevailed that an entirely unchanging and eternal deity should be considered normative for theology. He considered the deity of the classical tradition as at once too active and too passive. It is too active in the sense that nothing falls outside its control; the creatures are left to unwittingly play roles decided for them in eternity—“imitations of life” as Jules Lequyer called them. It is too static in the sense that it cannot change or be affected by the triumphs and tragedies of the creatures. In short, it is a deity that acts but is never acted upon and can therefore never interact. This is captured in the Aristotelian formula that was borrowed and reinterpreted by medieval thinkers to denote the God of the Abrahamic traditions: God as the “unmoved mover.” In a discussion of Mortimer Adler’s use of this formula, Hartshorne once called it a half-truth parading as the full truth. Hartshorne admired Abraham Heschel for reversing this idea by calling God the “most moved mover” (a phrase later adopted by Clark Pinnock). Hartshorne amended this formula to distill the essence of dipolar or neoclassical theism: God is the most and best moved mover.

8. Suggestions for Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. Books (in order of appearance)

Hartshorne, Charles. 1941. Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism. Chicago: Willett, Clark and Company.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1948. The Divine Relativity: A Social Conception of God. New Haven. Connecticut: Yale University Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1953. Reality as Social Process: Studies in Metaphysics and Religion. Boston: Beacon Press.
Hartshorne, Charles and William L. Reese, eds. 1953. Philosophers Speak of God. University of Chicago Press. Republished in 2000 by Humanity Books.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1962. The Logic of Perfection and Other Essays in Neoclassical Metaphysics. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1965. Anselm’s Discovery: A Re-examination of the Ontological Proof for God’s Existence. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. A Natural Theology for Our Time. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1976. Aquinas to Whitehead: Seven Centuries of Metaphysics of Religion. Milwaukee, Wisconsin: Marquette University Publications.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. Creativity in American Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes. Albany: State University of New Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1987. Wisdom as Moderation: A Philosophy of the Middle Way. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1997. The Zero Fallacy and Other Essays in Neoclassical Philosophy, edited by Mohammad Valady. Peru, Illinois: Open Court Publishing Company.
Hartshorne, Charles. 2011. Creative Experiencing: A Philosophy of Freedom, edited by Donald W. Viney and Jincheol O. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Auxier, Randall E. and Mark Y. A. Davies, editors. 2001. Hartshorne and Brightman on God, Process, and Persons: The Correspondence, 1922-1945. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press.
Viney, Donald W., guest editor. 2001. Process Studies, Special Focus on Charles Hartshorne, 30/2 (Fall-Winter)
Viney, Donald W., guest editor. 2011. Process Studies, Special Focus Section: Charles Hartshorne, 40/1 (Spring/Summer): 91-161.

ii. Hartshorne’s Response to his Critics

Cobb, John B. Jr. and Franklin L Gamwell, editors. 1984. Existence and Actuality: Conversations with Charles Hartshorne. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Hahn, Lewis Edwin, editor. 1991. The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers Volume XX. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Kane, Robert and Stephen H. Phillips, editors. 1989. Hartshorne, Process Philosophy and Theology. Albany State University of New York Press.
Sia, Santiago, editor. 1990. Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God: Philosophical and Theological Responses. Dordrecht, the Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers.

iii. Selected Articles

Hartshorne, Charles. 1945. Entries for “Eternal” (256), “Eternity” (257), “Foreknowledge, Divine” (284), “Omniscience” (546-47), “time” (787-88), “transcendence” (791-92) in An Encyclopedia of Religion, ed. Vergilius Ferm. New York: Philosophical Library.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1950. “The Divine Relativity and Absoluteness: A Reply [to John Wild].” Review of Metaphysics 4, 1: 31-60.
Hartshorne, Charles.1966. “A New Look at the Problem of Evil,” Current Philosophical Issues: Essays in Honor of Curt John Ducasse, edited by Frederick C. Dommeyer. Springfield, Illinois: Charles C. Thomas: 201-212.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. “Religion in Process Philosophy,” Religion in Philosophical and Cultural Perspective: A New Approach to the Philosophy of Religion Through Cross Disciplinary Studies, edited by J. Clayton Feaver and William Horosz. Princeton, New Jersey: D. Van Nostrand Company, Inc.: 246-268.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. “The Dipolar Conception of Deity.” Review of Metaphysics 21, 2: 273-89.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1969. “Divine Absoluteness and Divine Relativity.” Transcendence, eds. Herbert W. Richardson and Donald R. Cutler. Boston: Beacon: 164-71.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1971. “Could There Have Been Nothing? A Reply [to Houston Craighead].” Process Studies 1, 1: 25-28.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1976. “Synthesis as Polydyadic Inclusion: A Reply to Sessions’ Charles Hartshorne and Thirdness,” Southern Journal of Philosophy 14/2: 245-55.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1977. “Bell’s Theorem and Stapp’s Revised View of Space-Time.” Process Studies 7/3 (Fall): 183-191.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1978. “Theism in Asian and Western Thought.” Philosophy East and West 28, 4: 401-11.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1980. “Mysticism and Rationalistic Metaphysics.” Understanding Mysticism, edited by Richard Woods. Garden City, New York: Image: 415-421.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. “Toward a Buddhisto-Christian Religion.” Buddhism and American Thinkers, edited by Kenneth K. Inada and Nolan P. Jacobson. Albany State University of NewYork Press: 1-13.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1992. “The Aesthetic Dimensions of Religious Experience.” Logic, God and Metaphysics, edited by James Franklin Harris. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 9-18.
Hartshorne, Charles.1993. “Can Philosophers Cooperate Intellectually: Metaphysics as Applied Mathematics.” The Midwest Quarterly 35/1 (Autumn): 8-20.

b. Secondary Sources

Blanchette, Oliva. 1994. “The Logic of Perfection in Aquinas.” Thomas Aquinas and His Legacy. Edited by David M. Gallagher. Studies in Philosophy and the History of Philosophy, Volume 28. Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press: 107-130.
Boyd, Gregory A. Trinity and Process: A Critical Evaluation and Reconstruction of Hartshorne’s Di-Polar Theism Towards a Trinitarian Metaphysics. New York: Peter Lang, 1992.
Burrell, David B. 1982. “Does Process Theology Rest on a Mistake?” Theological Studies 43/1 (March): 125-135.
Case-Winters, Anna. 1990. God’s Power: Traditional Understandings and Contemporary Challenges. Louisville, Kentucky: Westminster/John Knox Press.
Christ, Carol P. 2003. She Who Changes: Re-Imagining the Divine in the World. New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
Clarke, Bowman. 1966. Language and Natural Theology. The Hague: Mouton & Co.
Clarke, Bowman. 1995. “Two Process Views of God.” God, Reason and Religions: New Essays in the Philosophy of Religions. Edited by Eugene Thomas Long. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 61-74.
Clarke, W. Norris. 1990. “Charles Hartshorne’s Philosophy of God: A Thomistic Critique,” Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God: Philosophical and Theological Responses. Edited by Santiago Sia. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 103-23.
Davaney, Sheila Greeve. 1986. Divine Power: A Study of Karl Barth and Charles Hartshorne. Harvard Dissertations in Religion, number 19. Philadelphia: Fortress Press.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 1996. Analytic Theism, Hartshorne, and the Concept of God. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 2004. Divine Beauty: The Aesthetics of Charles Hartshorne. Nashville, Tennessee: Vanderbilt University Press.
Enxing, Julia and Klaus Müller, editors. 2011. Perfect Changes: Die Religionsphilosophie Charles Hartshornes. Regensburg: Friedrich Pustet.
Enxing, Julia. 2013. Gott im Werden. Die Prozesstheologie Charles Hartshorne. Regensburg: Friedrich Pustet.
Fitzgerald, Paul. 1972. “Relativity Physics and the God of Process Philosophy.” Process Studies 2/4 (Winter): 251-276.
Ford, Lewis S. 1968. “Is Process Theism Compatible with Relativity Theory?” Journal of Religion 48/2 (April): 124-135.
Geisler, Norman L. 1976. “Process Theology.” Tensions in Contemporary Theology. Edited by Stanley N. Gundry and Alan F. Johnson. Chicago: Moody Press: 235-284.
Alan Gragg. 1973. Charles Hartshorne, Maker of the Modern Theological Mind, edited by Bob E. Patterson. Waco, Texas: Word Books Publisher.
Griffin, David Ray, John B. Cobb Jr., Marcus P. Ford, Pete A. Y. Gunter, and Peter Ochs. 1993. Founders of Constructive Postmodern Philosophy: Peirce, James, Bergson, Whitehead, and Hartshorne. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Gruenler, Royce Gordon. 1983. The Inexhaustible God: Biblical Faith and the Challenge of Process Theism. Grand Rapids, Michigan: Baker Book House.
Gunton, Colin E. 1978. Becoming and Being: The Doctrine of God in Charles Hartshorne and Karl Barth. Oxford University Press.
James, Ralph E. 1967. The Concrete God, A New Beginning for Theology—The Thought of Charles Hartshorne. Indianapolis, Indiana: The Bobbs-Merrill Company.
Kachappilly, Kurian. 2002. God of Love: A Neoclassical Inquiry. Bangalore, India: Dharmaram Publications.
Moskop, John C. 1984. Divine Omniscience and Human Freedom: Thomas Aquinas and Charles Hartshorne. Foreword by Charles Hartshorne. Macon, Georgia: Mercer University Press.
Myers, William, guest editor. 1998. The Personalist Forum, Special Issue on Charles Hartshorne, 14/2 (Fall).
Nash, Ronald H. editor. 1987. Process Theology. Grand Rapids, Michigan: Baker Book House.
Neville, Robert C. 1980. Creativity and God: A Challenge to Process Theology. New York: The Seabury Press.
Neville, Robert C. 2009. Realism in Religion: A Pragmatist’s Perspective. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Peters, Eugene H. 1970. Hartshorne and Neoclassical Metaphysics. Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
Pratt, Douglas. 2002. Relational Deity: Hartshorne and Macquarrie on God. Lanham, Maryland: University Press of America.
Ramal, Randy, editor. 2010. Metaphysics, Analysis, and the Grammar of God: Process and Analytic Voices in Dialogue .Tübingen, Germany: Mohr Siebeck.
Sanders, John. 2007. The God Who Risks: A Theology of Divine Providence, revised edition. Downers Grove, Illinois: IVP Academic.
Shields, George W. 1983. “God, Modality and Incoherence.” Encounter 44/1: 27-39.
Shields, George W. 1992. “Hartshorne and Creel on Impassibility,” Process Studies 21/1 (Spring): 44-59.
Shields, George W. 1992. “Infinitesimals and Hartshorne’s Set-Theoretic Platonism” The Modern Schoolman 49/2 (January): 123-134.
Shields, George W. 2003. “Omniscience and Radical Particularity: Reply to Simoni,” Religious Studies 39/2 (October).
Shields, George W. 2009. “Quo Vadis?: On Current Prospects for Process Philosophy and Theology,” The American Journal of Theology & Philosophy, 30/2 (May).
Shields, George W. 2010. “Eternal Objects, Middle Knowledge, and Hartshorne: A Response to Malone-France,” Process Studies, 39/1 (Spring/Summer): 149-165.
Shields, George W. 2010. “Panexperientialism, Quantum Theory, and Neuroplasticity” in Process Approaches to Consciousness, eds. Michel Weber and A. Weekes. (Albany: State University of New York Press).
Shields, George W., editor. 2003. Process and Analysis: Whitehead, Hartshorne, and the Analytic Tradition. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Sia, Santiago. 1985. God in Process Thought: A Study in Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God. Postscript by Charles Hartshorne. Dordrecht, the Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff.
Sia, Santiago. 2004. Religion, Reason and God: Essays in the Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne and A. N. Whitehead. Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang.
Sia, Santiago, editor. 1986. Process Theology and the Christian Doctrine of God, special edition of Word and Spirit, a Monastic Review, 8. Petersham, Massachusetts: St. Bede’s Publications.
Simoni-Wastila, Henry. 1999. “Is Divine Relativity Possible? Charles Hartshorne on God’s Sympathy with the World.” Process Studies 28/1-2 (Spring-Summer): 98-116.
Sprigge, T. L. S. 2006. The God of Metaphysics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Suchocki, Marjorie Hewitt and John B. Cobb, Jr. editors. 1992. Process Studies, Special Issue on the Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, 21/2 (Summer).
Towne, Edgar A. 1997. Two Types of Theism: Knowledge of God in the Thought of Paul Tillich and Charles Hartshorne. New York: Peter Lang.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 1985. Charles Hartshorne and the Existence of God. Albany State University of New York Press.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 1989. “Does Omniscience Imply Foreknowledge? Craig on Hartshorne.” Process Studies, 18/1 (Spring): 30-37.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2000. “What is Wrong with the Mirror Image? A Brief Reply to Simoni-Wastila on the Problem of Radical Particularity,” Process Studies, 29/2 (Fall-Winter): 365-367.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2005. “Hartshorne, Charles (1897-2000)” The Dictionary of Modern American Philosophers, edited by John R. Shook (London: Thoemmes Press): 1056-62.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2006. “God as the Most and Best Moved Mover: Charles Hartshorne’s Importance to Philosophical Theology.” The Midwest Quarterly, 48/1: 10-28.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2007. “Hartshorne’s Dipolar Theism and the Mystery of God.” Philosophia, 35: 341-350.
Wilcox, John T. 1961. “A Question from Physics for Certain Theists.” Journal of Religion 40/4 (October): 293-300.
Wood, Forest Jr. and Michael DeArmey, editors. 1986. Hartshorne’s Neo-Classical Theology. Tulane Studies in Philosophy, volume 34.

c. Bibliography

“Primary Bibliography of Philosophical Works of Charles Hartshorne” (compiled by Dorothy Hartshorne; corrected, revised, and updated by Donald Wayne Viney and Randy Ramal) in Herbert F. Vetter, editor, Hartshorne: A New World View: Essays by Charles Hartshorne (Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard Square Library, 2007): 129-160. Also published in Santiago Sia, Religion, Reason and God (Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang, 2004): 195-223.

Author Information

Donald Wayne Viney
Email: don_viney@yahoo.com
Pittsburg State University
U. S. A.

and

George W. Shields
Email: George.shields@kysu.edu
Kentucky State University
U. S. A.

Charles Hartshorne: Biography and Psychology of Sensation

Charles Hartshorne is widely regarded as having been an important figure in twentieth century metaphysics and philosophy of religion. His contributions are wide-ranging. He championed the aspirations of metaphysics when it was unfashionable, and the metaphysic he championed helped change some of the fashions of philosophy. He counted some well-known scientists among his friends, and he embraced the deliverances of modern science (he never questioned, for example, the truth of evolution); however, he insisted that metaphysics and empirical science have different aims and methods, each ensuring in its own way a disciplined objectivity. His “neoclassical” or “process” metaphysics is in the same family of speculative philosophy that one finds in the works of Charles Sanders Peirce and the later writings of Alfred North Whitehead. Although he did not style himself a disciple of Peirce or of Whitehead, he made significant contributions to the study of these philosophers even as he developed his own views. Like them, he endeavored in his own metaphysical thinking to give full weight to the dynamic, relational, temporal, and affective dimensions of the universe. He emphasized, as few before him had, in logic and in the processes of nature, the foundational nature of asymmetrical relations.

Hartshorne was also a theist at a time when the coherence of theism was under attack from quarters as various as logical positivism and Sartre’s existentialism. Hartshorne’s name is inseparable from the revival of the ontological or modal argument for God’s existence, having devoted twenty-three articles and the better part of two books to the topic. He insisted, however, that it was unavailing to appeal to the ontological argument (or any theistic argument) as support for theism without first rethinking the concept of deity. He argued that thinking about God had been handicapped by lack of attention to the logically possible forms of theism, and in place of the unmoved mover of classical theology, he proposed “the most, and best, moved mover.” Hartshorne endorsed a “dipolar” version of theism according to which God is both necessary and contingent, but in different respects. Hartshorne sought a “panentheism” in which God includes the creatures without negating their distinctiveness. He argued that no putative inerrant revelation or infallible institution could negate the effects of the inherent fallibility of human knowledge. He occasionally worried that his “highly rationalized” form of theism would not have wide appeal; on the other hand, it was precisely a God of love and the love of God that were ever his “intuitive clue[s]” in philosophy. His ideas about deity influenced the philosophy of both religion and theology; Hartshorne had argued that it is necessary to take seriously an alternative to classical understandings of God that avoided their shortcomings while preserving their best insights.

Hartshorne did not devote all of his intellectual energies to metaphysics and philosophical theology. His first book, The Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation (1934), ventured empirical hypotheses about sensation, a subject to which he returned intermittently throughout his life. Also of note is his Born to Sing: An Interpretation and World Survey of Bird Song (1973), which established him as a serious ornithologist. What follows is an overview of Hartshorne’s life as well as a discussion of his first book and its relation to the larger themes of his philosophy.

Biography
The Affective Continuum and the Psychology of Sensation
Conclusion: Hartshorne’s Work on Sensation and the Rest of his Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Charles Hartshorne (pronounced “Harts-horne”; literally, “deer’s horn”) was born June 5, 1897 in Kittanning, Pennsylvania, the second of six children of Francis Cope Hartshorne (1868-1950), an Episcopal minister, and Marguerite Haughton Hartshorne (1868-1959). He and his brother Richard (1899-1992)—who would achieve fame as a geographer—attended Yeates Boarding School (1911-1915), where he acquired a life-long interest in ornithology. Later, he attended Haverford College (1915-1917), where he was a student of the Quaker mystic Rufus Jones. With America’s entry into the First World War imminent, Hartshorne volunteered for the medical corps and spent the war years (1917-1919) in Le Tréport, France as an orderly in a British hospital.

What Hartshorne referred to as “the second period” of his intellectual development began when he enrolled at Harvard in 1919. He majored in philosophy and minored in English literature. Among his teachers were James Haughton Woods (named after Hartshorne’s maternal grandfather), W. E. Hocking, H. M. Sheffer, Ralph Barton Perry, C. I. Lewis, and the psychologist L. T. Troland. He completed the Ph.D. in 1923, writing a 306 page dissertation titled An Outline and Defense of the Argument for the Unity of Being in the Absolute or Divine Good. The broad outlines of his later thought are evident in the dissertation, but he never published any part of it. He would later remark, in Creativity in American Philosophy (1984), that it was a form of process philosophy that was “somewhat naïve and best forgotten.” Nevertheless, he was productive throughout his career, writing twenty-one books and over five hundred articles and reviews.

After graduation, Hartshorne returned to Europe as a Sheldon Traveling Fellow (1923-1925). He spent most of his time in Germany, but he also visited England, France, and Austria. He was fluent in German and spoke French reasonably well. His travels were rich with intellectual stimulation. In Europe he encountered many philosophical luminaries, including Moritz Schlick, Heinrich Gomperz, Lucien Lévy-Bruhl, Edouard Le Roy, Lucien Laberthonnière, Samuel Alexander, R. G. Collingwood, J. S. Haldane, G. E. Moore, G. F. Stout, Harold H. Joachim, Richard Kroner, Oskar Becker, Julius Ebbinghaus, Max Scheler, Max Planck, Adolf Harnack, Jonas Cohn, Paul Natorp, and Nicolai Hartmann. The most famous philosophers he met and with whom he studied were Edmund Husserl and Martin Heidegger. On his return to the United States, Hartshorne wrote the first English language review of Heidegger’s Sein und Zeit (Being and Time); the review appeared in the Philosophical Review and was published as part of the penultimate chapter of his second book.

Hartshorne was an Instructor and Research Fellow at Harvard (1925-1928) where he was simultaneously exposed to the two thinkers with whose philosophies he felt the most affinity: Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914) and Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947). Boxes of Peirce’s unpublished manuscripts were donated to the Harvard library by Peirce’s widow, and Hartshorne was given the assignment of editing these papers. In 1927, Paul Weiss joined Hartshorne in the project. The Collected Papers of Charles Sanders Peirce was published in six volumes between 1931 and 1935 and would become the standard edition of Peirce’s work throughout the century. Although Hartshorne published enough articles on Peirce to fill a book—a total of seventeen—neither he nor Weiss thought of becoming Peirce scholars. Hartshorne’s duties at Harvard also included helping to grade papers for Whitehead, who was a recent addition to the faculty (1924). As Whitehead’s assistant, Hartshorne witnessed the Englishman develop “the philosophy of organism” that would find expression in Whitehead’s Gifford Lectures, published as Process and Reality (1929). This book, as well as others written by Whitehead during this period, formed the foundation of twentieth century process philosophy.

Hartshorne’s earliest writings, prior to his encounter with Whitehead, emphasize process and relativity as metaphysically basic; for this reason, he characterized his relation to Whitehead (also to Peirce) as one of pre-established harmony. Just as he would write much on Peirce’s philosophy, so he promoted Whitehead’s importance in thirty-nine articles and reviews; thirteen of these articles are collected in Whitehead’s Philosophy: Selected Essays 1935-1970 (1972). For a time Hartshorne considered himself a Peircean and a Whiteheadian, in each case, as he said, “with reservations”—in later years he emphasized the reservations. It is clear, in any event, that the exposure to Peirce and Whitehead helped him to focus his thinking. Whitehead’s works, in particular, provided him with a technical vocabulary for expressing his own metaphysics that in some respects overlaps with Whitehead’s but in other respects is very different from it. In the fullness of time, these differences led some Whitehead scholars to complain of an overly Hartshornean slant to Whitehead studies, thus bearing testimony to Hartshorne’s dominance. Hartshorne referred to the years between 1925 and 1958 as his “third period” to highlight the significant influence of Peirce and Whitehead on his thinking.

When Harvard announced that they had “no job” for Hartshorne after his third year of teaching and research, he took a position in 1928 at the University of Chicago, where he was a faculty member in the Department of Philosophy until 1955. He eventually held a joint appointment as a member of the Meadville Theological School (1943-1955). Shortly after the move to Chicago, he married Dorothy Eleanore Cooper (1904-1995), his life-long companion. The Hartshorne’s only child, Emily (Schwartz), was born in 1940. In 1936, he served as secretary (that is, chairperson) of the department of philosophy, during which time Rudolf Carnap was hired. Hartshorne was a visiting faculty at Stanford University in 1937, and he spent the 1941-42 academic year at the New School in New York. From 1948 to 1949 he taught at Goethe University in Frankfurt and also lectured at the Sorbonne in Paris. He was president of the Western Division of the American Philosophical Association in 1949, and he was a Fulbright Lecturer at Melbourne, Australia during 1951-52. Hartshorne was also a member of the informal group of theologians called “the Chicago school,” which included Henry Nelson Wieman, Daniel Day Williams, Bernard Meland, and Bernard Loomer.

At Chicago, Hartshorne’s thinking matured, and he developed the outlines of his own system of speculative philosophy, which he called neoclassical metaphysics. The hiring of Carnap was especially ironic since he was the most famous of the logical positivists while Hartshorne was one of positivism’s greatest critics. However, Hartshorne reported that, despite his and Carnap’s profound differences in philosophical outlook, their engagement was cordial and fruitful. The German helped him to formalize his objection to the classical understanding of divine foreknowledge in his book The Divine Relativity (1948). Hartshorne published six books while at Chicago (in addition to the Peirce papers), including the wide-ranging survey of philosophical theology titled Philosophers Speak of God (1953/2000), edited with his student William L. Reese. Hartshorne’s other books during this period, apart from his first one, focused on the problems of metaphysics: Beyond Humanism: Essays in the Philosophy of Nature (1937), Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism (1941), and Reality as Social Process: Studies in Metaphysics and Religion (1953).

Hartshorne attracted many graduate students from Chicago’s three federated seminaries, two of whom became well-known theologians (John B. Cobb, Jr., b. 1925, and Schubert Ogden, b. 1928). He was unhappy, however, that few graduate students in philosophy studied with him. Two of the most well-known students in Hartshorne’s classes were Richard Rorty (1932-2007) and Huston Smith (b. 1919). Each became known for defending views at odds with Hartshorne’s ideas : Rorty in philosophy and Smith in religious studies. Even as he disagreed sharply with his former teacher, Rorty made clear that he never ceased to admire Hartshorne’s intellectual passion and generosity of spirit.

Hartshorne and his family left Chicago and moved to Atlanta, Georgia in 1955, where he taught at Emory University until 1962. In 1958, he taught at the University of Washington and visited Kyoto, Japan as a Fulbright Lecturer. There he learned more about Buddhism, which he called the first process philosophy. It was also in Japan that he began a more intense focus on Anselm of Canterbury’s ontological argument for God’s existence. He would soon publish in the second chapter of The Logic of Perfection (1962), for the first time in the history of philosophy, a formalization of the argument using modal symbolism. Soon afterwards came Anselm’s Discovery (1965), which includes an overview of treatments of the ontological argument in the works of various philosophers and theologians. Hartshorne described this time in his life as the beginning of his “fourth period,” as he gained more critical distance from the philosophies of Peirce and Whitehead and began in earnest to refine his own metaphysical synthesis. Now in his sixties, he faced mandatory retirement at Emory at age 68. In 1962, John Silber, then at the University of Texas at Austin, invited Hartshorne to Texas. Hartshorne accepted the invitation and, in 1963, became Ashbel Smith Professor of Philosophy; he taught full-time until his official retirement in 1978, and part-time for a few years thereafter. During his years at Texas he taught and traveled widely, throughout the United States, including two summer sessions at Colorado College (1977 and 1979), but also to India and Japan on a third Fulbright (1966), Australia (1974), the University of Louvain, Belgium (1978), and again to Japan and Hawaii (1984).

Hartshorne’s productivity in the last three decades of his life was prodigious, beginning with four major works; these included the aforementioned book on Whitehead, the book on bird song, as well as A Natural Theology for Our Time (1967) and Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method (1970), the latter being his most comprehensive and systematic presentation of neoclassical metaphysics. In his eighties, Hartshorne published dozens of articles, reviews, and forewords, and completed numerous books. Hartshorne gave his most complete assessment of western philosophy in Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers: An Evaluation of Western Philosophy (1983) and in Creativity in American Philosophy (1984). Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes (1984) is a nontechnical introduction to his philosophical theology. The posthumously published Creative Experiencing: A Philosophy of Freedom (2011), completed during the 1980s, complements Wisdom as Moderation: A Philosophy of the Middle Way (1987) and more or less rounds out the technical metaphysical work begun in Creative Synthesis.

The last of Hartshorne’s books to appear during his lifetime, The Zero Fallacy and Other Essays in Neoclassical Philosophy (1997), published in the year of his centenary, was edited by Muhammad Valady, a philosopher he met in 1985. Valady made a thorough study of Hartshorne’s works and engaged him in conversation on a regular basis over lunch. Valady compiled the essays in The Zero Fallacy to reflect the full range of Hartshorne’s thinking, including his empirical work on sensation and on bird song (approximately half the book is comprised of essays not previously published). The book opens with a “brisk dialogue” between Hartshorne and Valady that conveys both the charm of a conversation with the aging philosopher as well as the keenness of his mind in dealing with philosophy. In his twilight years, Hartshorne also contributed to four books devoted exclusively to his thought, giving detailed replies to sixty-two essays by fifty-six scholars (see secondary sources, books edited by Cobb and Gamwell, Kane and Phillips, Sia, and Hahn). His responses fill approximately one fourth of the pages in these volumes. With good reason he expressed concern that philosophers might find it difficult to stay abreast of his writing.

Hartshorne died on Yom Kippur, October 9, 2000 (incorrectly reported as October 10^th by The New York Times). He was preceded in death by his wife, who passed away at the age of ninety-one on November 21, 1995.

2. The Affective Continuum and the Psychology of Sensation

Hartshorne began thinking seriously about sensation after an experience he had while serving as an orderly in France during the First World War. As he stood on a cliff looking over a scene of great natural beauty, George Santayana’s phrase “beauty is objectified pleasure” came to him. Hartshorne rejected that slogan on the basis of what he was experiencing. It seemed to him that the pleasure was not experienced in himself as a subject and only then projected onto nature; rather the pleasure was itself given as in the object. He concluded that experience, all experience, is saturated with affect, given in emotional terms. In the essay “Some Causes of My Intellectual Growth” he says, “Nature comes to us as constituted by feelings, not as constituted by mere lifeless, insentient matter.” The point is not that we never attribute more to an object than what the object contains; it is, rather, that objects are never given to us in experience as completely lacking affective tone. Hartshorne never strayed from the conviction that matter devoid of feeling is an abstraction from experience and not a datum of experience.

Hartshorne’s first published book was The Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation (1934), the result of his intense philosophical interest in aesthetic motifs proffered by Peirce and Whitehead and his longstanding interest in empirical psychological inquiries into sensation begun under Troland at Harvard. This interest in empirical inquiries continued with study of some European experimental psychologists such as Julius Pikler, whose name is sometimes paired with Hartshorne’s in the literature on sensation, as in “the Hartshorne-Pikler Hypothesis” discussed by Lawrence E. Marks in The Unity of the Senses (New York: Academic, 1978). Hartshorne argues for a theory that, in his view, integrates themes of evolutionary biology with experimental and phenomenological data on intersensory analogies, with aesthetic and religious values, and with an overall enhancement of intelligibility or the “unity of knowledge.” The work was written when interest in sensation had dwindled under the influence of American behaviorist theory, when the odd indifference of William James to considerations of sensation was still lingering, and when psychologists were little interested in grand theoretical integrations, including integrations with evolutionary theory. The work, arguably ahead of its time, can be much better appreciated now than when it was first published.

Hartshorne’s theory is organized around the defense of five theses, to be discussed in turn below: (1) the sensory modalities exhibit quantitative continuity, exhibiting no absolute difference of kind; (2) sensory qualia are essentially affective (a theme echoed in the early Heidegger with whom Hartshorne studied); (3) all experience is analyzable as essentially social in the Whiteheadian sense of “feeling of feeling”; (4) sensation is essentially “adaptive” in the evolutionary biological sense; and, (5) sensory qualia have a common origin in evolutionary history. The whole doctrine might be conveniently labeled as the “affective continuum hypothesis.” The third item is central to the thesis of panexperientialism, which Hartshorne defended throughout his career. In view of its importance to his metaphysics, it will require separate discussion. Here the focus will be on a brief exposition of the other mentioned theses.

First, Hartshorne rejects the “classical” doctrine of Hermann von Helmholtz that the various sensory modalities (visual, olfactory, tactile, gustatory, and auditory experiences) are tightly compartmentalized, allowing no degrees of lesser or greater similarity, and no transition from one modality to another. According to the classical doctrine, while degrees of qualitative similarity or analogy might be permissible within a given sensory modality (for example, dark magenta and royal purple are qualitatively “closer” to one another than are, say, candy red and canary yellow), no inter-modal sensory analogies are permissible such that we could intelligibly say that, for instance, certain odors are more or less similar to certain colors. Moreover, the classical theory of sensation held that sensations are not inherently emotional or affective in character; any affective properties found to be associated with sensations are culturally conditioned “additions” to the sensations; in effect, sensations are essentially pure “registrations” of cognitive data. For classical theory, emotions and sensations are entirely separate functions of consciousness. To the contrary, Hartshorne argues that the classical theory does not fit the phenomenological and empirical evidence, is out of touch with the intersensory analogies provided in all manner of ordinary language metaphors, and does not cohere with the concept of an evolutionary history of sensory systems.

While experimentation on intersensory phenomena is a complex affair and interpretation of some results is disputable, it is fair to say that a body of evidence has emerged which bodes well for the thesis of intersensory connection. Indeed, it is now a commonplace of contemporary psychology texts to discuss evidence for intersensory analogies, for instance, the establishment of connections between visual and auditory neural systems as well as evidence of visual-auditory correlations in the cognitive development of infants. It is also particularly telling that neuroscientists have developed sensory substitution systems that can allow the blind to construct images, objects, and words from tactile stimulation. Moreover, Hartshorne points to abundant metaphors of common parlance which make intersensory connections: some colors are said to be “warm” or “loud,” some sounds are said to be “sweet” or “sour,” some affective states or moods are said to be “blue” or “dark,” or some smells are said to be “delicious” or “distasteful.” The practice of employing intersensory metaphors occurs widely across cultures and is broadly communicative or publically accessible, pointing (at the very least) to the possibility of intersensory continuity and to an underlying objective affect-quality in sensation, thus grounding the communicability of the intersensory metaphors. If the sensory modes are as rigidly separated and analogical connection is as unintelligible as classical theory maintains, it is difficult to explain that language is so saturated with intersensory metaphors. Hartshorne does not deny that there are strong qualitative differences between the qualia of various sensory modes (indeed his theory posits qualitative difference in terms of a geometric notion of “distance on a continuum”), nor does he deny that cultural conditioning can play an important role in constructing affective associations with sensations. Rather, his theory rejects the rigid discontinuity of the sensory modes and the separation of sensation from affectivity.

While Hartshorne is cognizant of cultural conditioning of sensory experience, he argues that such conditioning can be shown to presuppose an underlying affect in the “conditioned” sensation. Consider a locus classicus case of culturally constructed associations of affectivity in classical theory: the preference for white dress in traditional Chinese funerals as opposed to black or dark dress in traditional Spanish or Italian funerals is said to show that there are fundamentally different emotional qualities attached to white in Chinese as opposed to European cultures. Hartshorne argues that this misconstrues the situation. The cultural difference is found in different attitudes toward death and funeral rites, not in different feelings concerning the colors white or black (the Chinese think of funerals as positive celebrations of past life). Hartshorne also applies this reasoning to variations in individual sensory-qualitative preferences. In Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method, he remarks on how the fact that some persons prefer a certain bitter quality of strong dark chocolate does not show that such individuals “fail to sense the contrast, sweet-bitter, as essentially positive-negative.” It means rather that they do not want mere sweetness or pleasantness; they want a more complex sensory experience. Hartshorne’s point is that an adequate phenomenology of sensation must include the appropriate “layered” complexity of sensory experience and thus accommodate the fact that we have meta-feelings (“feelings about our sensory feelings”) in addition to “object-feelings” (feelings about things that are not feelings, like chocolate). It is the duality of this, so to speak, “meta-feeling/object-feeling” situation which is the source of the distinction (which Hartshorne calls a “pseudo-duality”) of affect and mere sensation posited by the classical theory of sensation.

In addition, it is not clear how the classical view can be squared with the evolutionary development of sensory modes. If the sensory modes are as separate as classical theory supposes, then how could new sensory modes which evolve have meaningful connections to older modes? Were the transitions from one mode to another simply de novo additions abruptly occurring all-at-once, contrary to standard neo-Darwinian assumptions of gradualism? If one sensory mode evolved from another, then how could it be impossible for the new sensory mode to have analogical connections with its modal parent? How could information from the different sensory modes be coordinated during early moments of evolutionary transition if there is no meaningful analogical connection between them? Would not an organism that possessed the capacity to integrate information from different sensory modes be better adapted to its environment? Hartshorne’s theory, on the other hand, supposes that sensory modes are intrinsically connected by their common evolutionary origins (with tactile capacities as the earliest), that sensation is a form of affectivity that serves the purpose of enhancing the prospects of an organism’s survival, and that this underlying physiological connection of sensation and affectivity is what is primal—it is the “object-feeling” pole of the “meta-feeling/object-feeling” duality found in our complex emotional life.

The affective properties of sensation are most immediately evident in the case of pain; indeed, intense sensations of pain are ineluctably described in strongly affective terms such as “horrific” or “torturous” or “excruciating.” While there may be cases in which, paradoxically, pain is experienced as pleasure, such cases by definition posit a hedonic property to the experience inimical to the notion of a thoroughly “disinterested” pain. The affective aversion that is part and parcel of the experience of pain also clearly coheres with the biological or adaptive value of affectivity that Hartshorne’s theory asserts. Organisms that are not warned of injury by virtue of pain, and that do not seek to avoid such injury by virtue of visceral, emotional aversion to pain, are insofar vulnerable to their environments. Other tactile qualia such as sensual touch are obviously inseparable from hedonic content. Gustatory qualia are also affective as enjoyment of delicious foods and strong aversion to extremely sour or spoiled foods attest. New born infants react with aversion to sour, bitter, or fetid substances, and so it is difficult to “argue away” gustatory affect as culturally conditioned. Here again, there are obvious biological or adaptive advantages for organisms capable of being affectively reinforced by and motivated to seek nutritious foods and avoid fetid substances or spoilage. Sounds, especially in the form of music, are readily seen to evoke emotions in immediate ways. Minor chords, for instance, have an immediate “sad” or “melancholy” tonality which explains their use in ballads evocative of such moods.

Hartshorne understood that the more difficult case for his theory is visual phenomena. For this reason, he discusses at length the affective nature of visual experience with a particular emphasis on color sensation. Careful attention to our experience of color reveals that strong primary colors exhibit affective qualities, as in the paradigm cases that “gaiety” is part and parcel of yellow and “warmth” of red. While Hartshorne admits that there seem to be dull color sensations to which we may seem affectively indifferent, that such sensations possess some slight degree of affect could be shown by imagining blindness with respect to such colors; in addition, such colors have a valuable contextual role to play in providing certain nuances of contrast. In his treatment of Hartshorne’s theory in the Library of Living Philosophers (LLP), psychologist Wayne Viney notes that some previously blind persons who are successfully re-sighted attach much significance even to the visually trivial. Importantly, Hartshorne argues that without such an affective account of color, it is extremely difficult to give a coherent account of the visual arts. If affective qualia are always merely accidently “associated” with color by virtue of idiosyncrasies of personal experience, how could artists communicate or express intelligibly? For instance, the dulled grayish-brownish tones of an Edward Hopper painting convey the depressive atmosphere of life during the Great Depression far better than would the alternative use of bright yellows or Kelly greens or Titian reds. Indeed, certain projects of modern art, such as found in the work of Kandinksy, depend on the notion that color expression can in and by itself evoke emotion without mediation through well-defined objects, whether in surreal juxtaposition or otherwise.

Adaptive values for color sensation are not difficult to conceive. The greater discriminatory information provided by color sensation at least enhances, say, human abilities to demarcate and map out their immediate environments. Moreover, at least one affective property of color can be correlated with experimental neuro-physical evidence; the inherent “aggressiveness” of red correlates with the empirically discerned increase in cortical stimulation when compared to exposure to blue. While this may be explained by cultural conditioning (for example, our learned response to red stop signs), such an explanation may also beg the question as to why red is so often selected as a color of warning. On Hartshorne’s theory, the selection of red occurs precisely because it has the stimulating or aggressive affect it does. In general, Hartshorne sides with Julius Pikler in connecting all affectivity of sensation at its most fundamental level with excitations to act or with behavioral avoidances, and these in turn have an evolutionary “cash value” or utility. Nonetheless, empirical study of the affectivity of color sensation is by no means settled, and results are unclear, for one reason because it is difficult to separate out learned from universal emotional responses to color. Hartshorne’s theory, however, points in the direction of an overall evolutionary account of sensation. Even if Hartshorne has some of the details mishandled, the general thesis of color affect brings color vision in line with other sense modalities and best explains why it was strongly “naturally selected.”

3. Conclusion: Hartshorne’s Work on Sensation and the Rest of his Philosophy

Hartshorne’s first book could be seen, in one respect, as a systematic attack against the form of materialism that finds inspiration in the theory of sense data. From the times of John Locke and David Hume, some empirically minded philosophers and psychologists analyzed experience in terms of “sensory impressions.” Emotions were conceived as annexed onto bare impressions; Hartshorne characterizes this as “the annex view of value.” As already noted, this view of emotion is at odds with evolutionary thinking since a sensation-minus-affect would be lacking in adaptive value. Equally, it is not clearly a deliverance of experience. The analysis of experience into sensory impressions is, Hartshorne held, bad phenomenology; it is an intellectualized reconstruction of experience. The mistake was, in part, due to the excessive attention paid to visual experience, which as we have noted, is where affect is least apparent. Visual experience exhibits less felt relevance of the body than one finds in the other sensory modalities. This may account for the prevalence of visual metaphors for a supposedly immaterial process of intellection. It is easier to forget that one sees with the eyes than it is to forget, for example, that one touches with the skin.

In light of Hartshorne’s conviction concerning the data of experience, it is not difficult to understand why he resonated to the expression “feeling of feeling,” an idea (if not the exact wording) that he found in Chapter X (section II) of Whitehead’s Process and Reality. The clearest instance of a feeling of feeling, for both Whitehead and Hartshorne, is memory, for it is at a minimum the record of a past experience in a present experience. The example of memory also supports Hartshorne’s contention that, while every sensation is a feeling, not every feeling is a sensation. Hartshorne would later refer to the difference between introspection and perception as the difference between personal and impersonal memory.

When Hartshorne came to the business of ontology, he could find nothing more consonant with his psychology of sensation, nothing more in keeping with evolutionary thinking, and nothing more coherent philosophically than panexperientialism, the view that the basic constituents of reality are momentary flashes of experience. Whitehead called these “actual entities” or “actual occasions”; Hartshorne sometimes called them dynamic singulars. Panexperientialism implies that there must be non-human and non-conscious forms of experience. Leibniz had argued this case before evolutionary theory, but evolution made the case even more convincing. Humans are different from the creatures from which they evolved by matters of degree. Mind-like qualities, Hartshorne argued, are susceptible to an infinitely flexible number of forms. Hartshorne and Whitehead held that every concrete particular is an experient occasion; they did not, however, believe that every whole made of such occasions can be said, as a whole, to feel the world. Whitehead spoke of a tree as a democracy, the cells making up its members—there can be cellular feelings even if the tree as a whole does not feel. Hartshorne used the analogy of a flock of birds: there are feelings in each bird, but the flock itself does not feel.

If Hartshorne followed Whitehead on the ontology of actual occasions, he parted ways with him on how best to construe the nature of possibility. Whitehead took possibility to be grounded in an array of eternal objects, including particular sensory qualities, constituting an ideal world. As is evident in his first book, Hartshorne preferred to think of sensory qualities as existing along an affective continuum. Whitehead, it seems, was not dogmatic in rejecting this view. Hartshorne reports that he presented Whitehead with the following reasoning: if points are constructed from the extensive continuum and not vice versa, as Whitehead held, perhaps, by parity of reasoning, particular sensory qualities are extracted from an affective continuum and not vice versa. According to Hartshorne, Whitehead called the argument “subtle” requiring “further reflection.” It is also worth remarking that Hartshorne’s view is more radically processive than Whitehead’s since it implies that sensory qualities are emergent as the affective continuum is sliced in various ways through the evolutionary process within and between species.

Hartshorne’s theory of the affective continuum is very much in keeping with his aesthetics and with his theory of a monotony threshold in song birds. Hartshorne’s aesthetics locates beauty—which could also be called intense satisfactory experience—as a mean between two extremes: absolute order vs. absolute disorder and ultra complexity vs. ultra triviality. Aesthetic experience, like all sensory experience, must have, on Hartshorne’s account, both a subjective and an objective side. In a word, Hartshorne denies that the quality of beauty is “merely in the eye of the beholder,” or to generalize, “merely in the perception of the perceiver.” Hartshorne’s study of bird song convinced him that oscines have a primitive aesthetic sense. He found evidence that birds with more varied repertoires have shorter pauses between their songs than do birds with less varied repertoires. In a word, simpler repertoires invoke more boredom whereas varied repertoires are more interesting—hence, a “monotony threshold.” Hartshorne meant his theory to supplement, not to replace, standard accounts of bird song as the marking of territory. His view of the aesthetics of bird song coheres nicely with his evolutionary view of sensation and affective tone.

Hartshorne’s emphases on the primacy of feeling in perception and of aesthetic experience are also evident in his form of theism. God, he held, has the eminent form of “feeling of the feelings” of others. In the first instance, this means that God’s knowledge is suffused with affect and is not simply an intellectual awareness of the world, for example, a knowing of the truth value of propositions. According to Hartshorne, divine cognition is a form of what William James called “knowledge of acquaintance” rather than simply a “knowledge-about.” This idea yields a view of omniscience that is decidedly more intimate than one that is couched in terms of the metaphor of an “all-seeing” deity. Since, for Hartshorne, the relation of “feeling of feelings” has a temporal structure, every instance of awareness in the present must be nothing other than an awareness of the past. It stands to reason that, if God is the eminent embodiment of “feeling of feelings,” God must also have the eminent form of memory. This is indeed Hartshorne’s view, which he calls “contributionism.” Every experience of a non-divine being is felt and retained in perfect memory by God, thereby contributing to the richness of the divine immortal life. In Hartshorne’s words, God’s possession of us, not our possession of God, is our final achievement.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. Life

Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. “The Development of My Philosophy.” Contemporary American Philosophy: Second Series, ed. John E. Smith. London: Allen & Unwin, 1970: 211-28.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. “Charles Hartshorne’s Recollections of Editing the Peirce Papers.” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 6, 3-4: 149-59.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1973. “Pensées sur ma vie”: 26-32; “Thoughts on my Life”: 60-66. Bilingual Journal, Lecomte du Noüy Association, 5 (Fall)
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. “How I Got that Way.” Existence and Actuality: Conversations with Charles Hartshorne. John B. Jr. and Franklin L Gamwell, eds. Chicago: University of Chicago Press: ix-xvii.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1990. The Darkness and the Light: A Philosopher Reflects Upon His Fortunate Career and Those Who Made it Possible. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1991. “Some Causes of My Intellectual Growth.” The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers Volume XX. Lewis Edwin Hahn, ed. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court: 3-45.

ii. Psychology of Sensation

Hartshorne, Charles.1927. Review of A.N. Whitehead. Symbolism, Its Meaning and Effect (New York: Macmillan, 1927). Hound and Horn 1: 148-52.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1931. “Sense Quality and Feeling Tone.” Proceedings of the Seventh International Congress of Philosophy. Gilbert Ryle, ed. London: Oxford UP: 168-72.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1934. The Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation. University of Chicago Press. Republished in 1968 by Kennikat Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1934. “The Intelligibility of Sensations.” The Monist 44, 2: 161-85.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1961. “Professor Hall on Perception.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 21, 4: 563-71.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1963. “Sensation in Psychology and Philosophy.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 1, 2: 3-14.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1965. “The Social Theory of Feelings.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 3, 2: 87-93. Reprinted in Persons, Privacy, and Feeling: Essays in the Philosophy of Mind, ed. Dwight Van de Vate, Jr. Memphis: Memphis State UP, 1970: 39-51.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. “Psychology and the Unity of Knowledge.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 5, 2: 81-90.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1973. Born to Sing: An Interpretation and World Survey of Bird Song. Bloomington, Indiana University of Indiana Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. “Response to George Wolf.” Existence and Actuality: Conversations with Charles Hartshorne. John B. Jr. and Franklin L Gamwell, eds. Chicago: University of Chicago Press: 184-188.
Hartshorne, Charles. 2001. Notes on A. N. Whitehead’s Harvard Lectures 1925-26, transcribed by Roland Faber. Process Studies 30/2: 301-373.

b. Secondary Sources

i. Life

Peters, Eugene H. 1970. Hartshorne and Neoclassical Metaphysics. Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press: 1-14.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2003. “Charles Hartshorne.” American Philosophers Before 1950. In Dictionary of Literary Biography, volume 270, edited by Philip B. Dematteis and Leemon B. McHenry. Detroit: Thomson Gale, 2003: 129-51.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2004. “Charles Hartshorne.” Dictionary of Unitarian Universalist Biography, 1999-2004. On-line at: http://www.uua.org/uuhs/duub/articles/ charleshartshorne.html
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2005. “Hartshorne, Charles (1897-2000)” The Dictionary of Modern American Philosophers, edited by John R. Shook (London: Thoemmes Press): 1056-62.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2008. “Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000),” Handbook of Whiteheadian Process Thought, Volume 2, edited by Michel Weber and Will Desmond. (Frankfurt / Paris / Lancaster: Ontos Verlag): 589-596.

ii. Psychology of Sensation

Anon. 1985. Report on Hartshorne’s “My Enthusiastic but Partial Agreement with Whitehead,” presented at the eleventh Congreso Ineramericasno de Filosifia, Guadalajara, Mexico, Nov. 15, 1985, Center for Process Studies Newsletter, 9, 4, 7.
Dombrowski, Daniel. 2004. Divine Beauty: The Aesthetics of Charles Hartshorne. Nashville, Tennessee: Vanderbilt University Press.
Hospers, John. 1991. “Hartshorne’s Aesthetics.” The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers Volume XX. Lewis Edwin Hahn, ed. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court: 113-134.
Viney, Wayne. 1991. “Charles Hartshorne’s Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation.” The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers Volume XX. Lewis Edwin Hahn, ed. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court: 91-112.

c. Bibliography

Author Information

Donald Wayne Viney
Email: don_viney@yahoo.com
Pittsburg State University
U. S. A.

and

George W. Shields
Email: George.shields@kysu.edu
Kentucky State University
U. S. A.

Charles Hartshorne: Theistic and Anti-Theistic Arguments

Charles Hartshorne is well known in philosophical circles for his rehabilitation of Anselm’s ontological argument. Indeed, he may have written more on that subject than any other philosopher. He considered it to be the argument that, more than any other, reveals the logical status of theism. Nevertheless, he always clearly and explicitly denied that the argument was his reason for being a theist. There are two reasons for this. First, he believed that, without a revision in the very concept of deity, Anselm’s argument could readily be turned upside down, so to speak, so as to constitute not a proof of theism but its disproof. Consequently, Hartshorne believed that a full defense of theism requires developing a coherent concept of God. (See “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism.”) Second, Hartshorne’s revised ontological argument does not stand alone. It is one strand in a fabric of reasoning which he sometimes called “the global argument.” He followed C. S. Peirce’s recommendation that philosophy should rely on a variety of interrelated pieces of evidence rather than trust to the conclusiveness of a single argument. Peirce (5.265) used the analogy of a cable, the strength of which is in the combination of its numerous fibers. Peirce specifically mentioned that this way of arguing is typical of science, but it is also evident in other areas such as law, history, and literary criticism. Nowadays, philosophers use Basil Mitchell’s terminology and call the multiple argument strategy a “cumulative case.” Hartshorne’s most systematic presentation of the global argument is in the fourteenth chapter of Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method, titled “Six Theistic Proofs.” Not long after this essay appeared, he stopped calling the arguments proofs, for he recognized that it is often the case that equally rational and informed philosophers disagree on fundamental issues. For this reason, he presented the global argument in a way that emphasizes both the rational basis of neoclassical theism and the rational cost of rejecting it. In addition to discussing Hartshorne’s case for theism, this article also addresses Hartshorne’s reflections on the problem of evil.

Anselm’s Discovery and the Ontological Argument
The Global Argument
The Problem of Evil and Theodicy
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Anselm’s Discovery and the Ontological Argument

It used to be customary to speak in the singular of “Anselm’s ontological argument.” Hartshorne was the first to argue that this is mistaken. Setting aside the question of Anselm’s intentions, Hartshorne found that two arguments are suggested in Anselm’s Proslogion, one in chapter II, another in chapter III. Hartshorne made this point in 1944 in an article published in The Philosophical Review and again in 1953 in Philosophers Speak of God. The philosophical world did not take notice until 1960 when Norman Malcolm’s article, “Anselm’s Ontological Arguments,” made the distinction between the two arguments famous. Hartshorne, like Malcolm, agreed with Anselm’s critics that the first argument (in chapter II) is fallacious, but the second argument (in chapter III), which has a modal structure, he considered valid. The difficulty in showing that the argument is sound kept Hartshorne from thinking of it as demonstrating God’s existence. In The Logic of Perfection, Hartshorne presented a formalized version of the argument using C. I. Lewis’s system S5, the first such formalization to be published. In Anselm’s Discovery, he again defended a version of the argument and canvassed the various treatments of Anselm’s reasoning in the history of philosophy, including an anticipation of the argument in Plato noted by the scholar Prescott Johnson.

In the introduction to George L. Goodwin’s The Ontological Argument of Charles Hartshorne, and again in Creative Experiencing, Hartshorne reduced the modal ontological argument to what he considered to be its essentials. The argument’s logical symbols are the tilde (~) for negation, the arrow (→) for strict implication, M for “is logically possible” (thus, “~M~” means “is logically necessary”), and p* stands for “God exists,” where God is defined as “a being unsurpassable by any other conceivable being.” (In Hartshorne’s dipolar theism, the divine can, in some senses, surpass itself but it is unsurpassable by any other being). The argument is presented as follows:

Mp*
Mp* → ~M~p*
Therefore, ~M~p*

If necessity (~M~) is what is common to all possibilities—a common definition—and if any state of affairs that is actual is also possible—a standard modal principle—then the conclusion to be drawn is that God exists (p*). Hartshorne was under no illusions that this mode of reasoning would convince the skeptic that God exists. Nor did he use it as his reason for believing in God. Nevertheless, the argument is not, in the hyperbole of Graham Oppy (199), “completely worthless.” In A Natural Theology for Our Time, Hartshorne credited George Mavrodes with the insight that it is unreasonable to suppose that no doubts about theism can be removed because an argument cannot remove all doubts about theism. Moreover, the simple deductive structure of the argument clarifies what is at stake in the theistic question. If one denies the conclusion, one must deny one or more of the premises or what their denials entail. Hartshorne follows Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz in urging that, in questions of metaphysics, philosophers are more apt to err in what they deny than in what they affirm. Highlighting the rational cost of rejecting theism can, for this reason, be a fruitful method in metaphysics.

If one rejects the conclusion of Hartshorne’s modal argument, one of two alternatives is possible. First, it may be that God’s existence is impossible (~Mp*), which is the denial of the first premise. This is the view that J. N. Findlay originally took in his famous 1948 article, “Can God’s Existence Be Disproved?” In effect, Findlay’s argument turns Hartshorne’s modal modus ponens upside down to make a modal modus tollens disproof: If M~p* and Mp* → ~M~p*, it follows that ~Mp*. Hartshorne referred to this as the a priori atheist or positivist position. The second alternative is that a logical consequence of the second premise is false. The strict implication of the second premise allows one to infer that if God’s existence is logically possible then it is logically necessary. If this is false, then God’s existence and non-existence are equally possible: Mp* and M~p*. This was the view of David Hume, for whom every proposition asserting or denying existence, including “God exists,” is logically contingent. Hartshorne calls this the empiricist position, or sometimes empirical theism or empirical atheism depending on whether or not the empiricist thinks that God exists.

Hartshorne considered the empiricist position regarding the ontological argument as the least tenable. The second premise says, colloquially, if God is so much as logically possible, then it must be the case that God exists. Hartshorne calls this “Anselm’s principle,” or more forcefully, “Anselm’s discovery.” The discovery is that God, as unsurpassable, cannot exist with the possibility of not existing. Put differently, contingency of existence is incompatible with deity. Anselm’s formula that God is “that than which nothing greater can be conceived” means, among other things, that any abstract characteristic for which something greater can be conceived cannot properly be attributed to deity. For example, if there is something greater than being partially ignorant, then God cannot be conceived as partially ignorant. Or again, if there is something greater than interacting with some but not all others, then God cannot be conceived as a merely localized being. Applied to modality of existence, Anselm’s principle means that a deity that can fail to exist is not the greatest conceivable. If correct it is then a mistake to conceive of God as possibly existing and possibly not existing. This is another way to state the second premise. One may deduce from this premise that it is impossible that God’s existence and non-existence are both logically possible. Symbolic notation presents this as ~M(Mp* and M~p*).

Hartshorne emphasized that the empiricist’s view he considers Anselm to have refuted is shared by, among others, those who consider the existence of God as a hypothesis to be established or refuted by science. Hartshorne accepts Karl Popper’s idea that empirical statements must be falsifiable by some conceivable experience (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). Anselm’s principle entails that if God exists, there could be no disconfirming empirical evidence of God’s existence. On the other hand, if God does not exist, then by parity of reasoning, there could be no confirming empirical evidence of God’s existence. If premise two is correct, the remaining options are that God exists necessarily (~M~p*) or God’s existence is impossible (~Mp*). This removes the question of God’s existence from the domain of science. Yet, this is not the same as removing the question from rational justification, unless metaphysics is impossible, a position that Hartshorne vigorously opposed. In effect, treating the existence of God as a scientific hypothesis is a failure to conceive of God as unsurpassable by any being other than God—and is therefore a changing of the subject.

Among the many criticisms of Hartshorne’s reasoning about the ontological argument, four stand out as deserving special treatment: one from J. N. Findlay, one from John Hick, one stemming from W. V. O. Quine’s reflections on modal logic, and one from H. G. Hubbeling. Each is set forth in The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne. Hartshorne praises Findlay for most clearly stating the objection that the concrete cannot be deduced from the abstract, and that this is what the ontological argument purports to do. Definitions are abstract, but God’s existence must be concrete; from the logically weak definition of God one may not deduce the logically stronger conclusion that God exists. Put somewhat differently, if the deduction succeeds, then God’s existence must be as abstract as God’s essence. Hartshorne’s response to Findlay is to accept the principle but to appeal to the distinction between existence and “actuality”––Hartshorne’s term for existence in a particular, determinate, concrete state (see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism, section 2”). To be sure, the ontological argument concludes to the existence of God, which is abstract, but more explicitly, it concludes to God’s existence as somehow actualized. No actual state of God—which is the concreteness of God—can be deduced by a metaphysical argument. The structure of this reasoning is analogous to Hartshorne’s argument that non-being is impossible (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). The statement “Something exists” may be necessarily true, as Hartshorne urges, although it gives no information as to what actually exists. It only says that the set of existing things is not empty. By parity of reasoning, the conclusion of Hartshorne’s modal argument can be rephrased to say that the set of actual divine states is never empty. With good reason, Hartshorne insisted that he knew very little about God. At most, his metaphysics yields only the most abstract truths about deity, although he stressed that it is a notable achievement to advance the subject of metaphysics when so few attend to its reasoning.

Hick pressed the objection that Hartshorne’s ontological argument confuses two kinds of necessity; one pertaining to propositions (logical necessity), the other pertaining to a being (ontological necessity). According to Hick, to say that God exists of necessity is to say no more than that God has the property of “aseity.” That is, God’s existence, unlike all creaturely existence, depends upon nothing outside of itself. This does not mean, Hick claims, that “God exists” is a necessary truth. To speak of God’s existence as logically necessary is, in Hick’s view, a category mistake; applying to a being a predicate that is properly a predicate of sentences. Hartshorne agrees with Hick that, excluding the case of God, all propositions asserting the existence or non-existence of an individual are logically contingent. However, in all of these cases, there is a causal explanation for the possibility of the individual’s existence which neatly explains why the proposition asserting or denying existence is not necessarily true. For example, the non-existence of x’s monozygotic twin is explained by the fact that the fertilized egg from which x came did not split; x’s existence also has a causal explanation in the union of a particular sperm and egg. Hartshorne notes that there is no analogous explanation, on Hick’s empiricist account, for why “God exists” is logically contingent. Yet, Hartshorne has a ready explanation for why the proposition is not logically contingent, an explanation moreover that Hick uses in explaining the meaning of divine necessity: neither God’s existence nor non-existence could have a causal explanation. In both The Logic of Perfection and Creative Experiencing, Hartshorne discusses other characteristics of logically contingent propositions that “God exists” lacks. For example, God’s existence includes all positive forms of existence whereas the existence of any creature within the universe excludes certain positive states of affairs. Hartshorne says that God’s existence is not competitive. Hartshorne’s conclusion is that, on Hick’s account, “God exists” breaks the usual semantic criteria for a proposition to count as logically contingent.

Hartshorne’s response to Hick is that the meanings of modal terms must be anchored in the causal-temporal matrix. If this is true, then only particular noun-adjective combinations are logically conceivable. Numerous parodies of the modal argument—beginning with Gaunilo’s “perfect island”—consist in joining the concept of necessary existence to real or imagined localized beings. On Hartshorne’s account these ideas are improperly conceived, for they cannot withstand the application of semantic criteria that distinguish contingent and necessary truths. Attaching necessary existence to a being that is properly conceived as contingent is the reverse of the error of attaching contingent existence to a being that is properly conceived as necessary. Hartshorne counts both extremes as errors. It is no accident that it was J. S. Mill, an empiricist, who made famous the question, “Who made God?” If “God” signifies a being unsurpassable by all others, then asking for the cause of God’s existence is on a par with asking what is north of the North Pole. Both questions are grammatical, but both are also nonsensical. Of course, on Hick’s account of divine aseity, it is also a mistake to ask for the cause of God’s existence. However, Hartshorne’s theory of the semantic grounding of modal terms in temporal process provides one reason why it is a mistake.

Another important objection to Hartshorne’s modal ontological argument, especially as presented in The Logic of Perfection, arises from Quine’s attack on the intelligibility of de re modality. While Hick criticized Hartshorne’s modal argument for moving illicitly from de dicto (linguistic) to de re (ontological) conceptions of modality, Quine’s strategy is to reject the very intelligibility of de re modality. If successful, such a critique would surely devastate the modal version of the argument since, for Hartshorne, “logical modality mirrors objective modality.”

Quine’s challenge to the intelligibility of de re modality has been taken up in great detail by Goodwin in his book The Ontological Argument of Charles Hartshorne. In his foreword of the work, Hartshorne endorses Goodwin’s approach. The arguments could be summarized as follows. Quine objected to the idea of de re modality, since it involves quantification across modal operators. For example, the formulation “(Ǝx) (necessarily, x is greater than seven)” is logically illicit, claims Quine, because the modal operator “necessarily” is inserted within a quantifier-bound variable-predicate expression. Quine points out that we cannot generalize existentially from the legitimate de dicto formulation:

Necessarily, nine is greater than seven.

to the illicit

(Ǝx) (necessarily, x is greater than seven).

This is because “nine” in (a) is referentially opaque; it fails to denote in a singular way, and thus opens the door to counter-examples in the generalized sentence (b). For instance, Quine says that “nine” can name “the number of planets,” but it is not a property of “the number of planets” that it is necessarily greater than seven. Given his theory of contingent states of affairs, Hartshorne would not object to the notion that “the number of planets,” presumably in our solar system, is indeed a contingency. The thrust of this is that, because of referential opacity in quantified modal logic, we do not know what it means to introduce propositions of the existentially generalized form (b). However, Goodwin notes that Hartshorne is indeed committed in his modal version of the argument to such forms as:

(Ǝx) (necessarily, x is perfect).

Consequently, an effective Hartshornean response to Quine’s critique requires an intelligible semantics for modal logic.

Goodwin argues that Saul Kripke supplies such a semantics in the essay, “Semantical Considerations on Modal Logic.” According to Kripke, we can give an intelligible account of sentences involving quantification into modal contexts. A sentence having the form of (b) can be interpreted to say: “there is an object, x, in this world which has the property “greater than seven,” and x has this property in every possible world in which x exists.” In other words, x exists in this world and at least some possible worlds accessible from this world, and x falls under the extension of the predicate “greater than seven” in every world in which it exists.” However, this only takes one so far in the provision of an (arguably) intelligible formal semantics for sentences involving quantification into modal contexts.

Quine replies that the very terms of this formal semantical solution to the problem of opacity raises the further question of what it means for an individual or object to exist in various possible worlds. This problem has come to be known as the problem of “trans-world identity.” Quine challenges any response to his critique of de re modality based on Kripke’s semantics by arguing that Kripke’s solution to referential opacity ushers in a semantics involving the difficulty of “essential properties.” For instance, let the value for x be C. S. Peirce, while the predicate attributed to x is “being a speculative philosopher.” Must Peirce be a speculative philosopher in any possible world in which he exists in order to be Peirce in such worlds? Could Peirce be a “seventeenth century sea captain” in some possible worlds and still intelligibly remain Peirce in such possible worlds?

It is precisely here, argues Goodwin, that Hartshorne’s ontology of temporal process can be employed, providing Kripke with intelligible criteria for making trans-world identifications. The problem of trans-world identity seems perplexing and insolvable when assuming, to use Quine’s phrase, “Aristotelian essentialism,” in which essential properties belong to substances that make no inherent reference to temporality. By contrast, Hartshorne’s process or event ontology positions the search for an intelligible criterion for trans-world identity in the much wider matrix of successive and causally efficacious temporal units of becoming. This is one reason why Hartshorne prefers to speak of “possible world-states” rather than “possible worlds” (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). Temporal inheritance becomes the essential factor in determining identity, and thus more readily settles the above questions: Peirce might well exist as, say, a professional painter in some possible world-state, since he might have been one in the history of this actual world; that is, since there may have been a juncture in Peirce’s development in which he was not particularly taken with questions of speculative philosophy, but was exposed to an environment of intense interest in artistic expression. Yet, surely he could not be, in any possible world-state, a seventeenth century sea captain, since this would bear nothing in common with his succession of temporal events. To conclude the issue cautiously, perhaps we should say that, even if Hartshorne’s event-ontological criterion of temporal inheritance does not fully resolve the issue of trans-world identity, it seems to simplify it profoundly. More pointedly, this criterion directly answers Quine’s charge of the unintelligibility of solutions based on Aristotelian essentialism that appeal to temporally de-contextualized substances.

A technically sophisticated objection to Hartshorne’s modal argument, especially as expressed in The Logic of Perfection, comes from H. G. Hubbeling. He presents Hartshorne with a dilemma: the modal argument is valid if and only if the theory of temporal modalities is false. The problem is that Hartshorne’s argument is expressed in Lewis’s S5 system in which modal status is necessary. Symbolically (where L = ~M~), it is presented as such: “If Lp* then LLp*” and “If Mp* then LMp*.” Temporal modalities, however, are best expressed in Lewis’s weaker S4 system, which includes the first of these formulae as an axiom but the second formula is neither an axiom nor a theorem. Without “If Mp* then LMp*” Hartshorne’s argument is not valid, for then it could be the case that God’s existence is possible but not necessarily so. On the other hand, Hartshorne wants to ground the meaning of modal terms in temporal process. The most plausible semantics for S5, however, leaves modal concepts untethered to time.

It is to be noted, however, that Hartshorne gave other versions, both informal and formal (such as the version used above) which do not depend on S5. Hartshorne was convinced that an element of intuitive judgment that goes beyond the logical formalism is involved in assessing the argument. However, granting the element of intuitive judgment does not directly answer Hubbeling’s dilemma. What remains is whether Hubbeling’s challenge can be met from within Hartshorne’s form of dipolar theism. It seems true that S5 is the appropriate modal system for expressing the abstract point of the argument relating to God’s unique characteristic of existence in every possible state of affairs. S5’s property of complete “world accessibility” symmetry is exactly what is needed. On the other hand, S4 is applicable to the description of what Hartshorne calls God’s actuality or God’s concrete states. So, Hartshorne’s distinction between existence and actuality maps onto the S5/S4 distinction. (For more on the existence/actuality distinction, see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism,” section 2).

2. The Global Argument

If Hartshorne is correct, the ontological argument reveals the logical status of the theistic question as metaphysical rather than empirical. The argument falls short of a proof of theism, in large measure, because it depends on the premise that the existence of God is logically possible. Hartshorne’s own arguments against classical theism show that this is not an acceptable premise. Hartshorne once commented that John Duns Scotus also concluded that the question of God’s existence is not empirical. Hartshorne added, “My quarrel with him is that I regard his form of theism as either self-inconsistent or meaningless” (Viney 1985, x). Hartshorne believed that the weak premise in the modal argument is the first one, that “God” names a possible reality. He said in his reply to Hick that all of his misgivings about believing in God rested on the suspicion, which is difficult to remove, that every form of theism masks an absurdity. At least in part, this explains Hartshorne’s efforts to defend metaphysics as both the search for necessary truths about existence and the development of a coherent dipolar theism. One can think of the global argument as the completion of this process. Discounting the modal argument, each element of Hartshorne’s cumulative case is designed to buttress the claim that the existence of God is logically possible.

The various strands of the global argument highlight what Hartshorne considered to be the theistic implications of neoclassical metaphysics. Each argument is given a familiar name that suggests precursors in the history of philosophy, but none of them has an exact equivalent in the world’s philosophical literature. In addition to the ontological argument, Hartshorne develops his own versions of the cosmological, teleological, epistemic, moral, and aesthetic arguments. In keeping with Hartshorne’s use of position matrixes, each argument is presented as a logically exhaustive set of options. We have already hinted at this style of reasoning in the modal argument where one has the choice that God’s existence is a necessity (~M~p*), an impossibility (~Mp), or a contingency (Mp* and M~p*). Other strands of the global argument are also presented in this way: to affirm one alternative is to deny all others, and alternately, to deny one is to affirm that only one of the others is true. In each case, Hartshorne employs what he calls “the principle of least paradox” to conclude that the rational cost of rejecting neoclassical theism is greater than the cost of accepting it. Time and again, Hartshorne acknowledged the difficulties of an unqualified verdict in favor of neoclassical theism, but he also believed that his view better answered the questions of metaphysics than his rivals. Hartshorne was epistemically cautious in recognizing that his method would not yield a decisive victory for his own views. As with the modal argument, Hartshorne believed that no degree of logical rigor can eliminate the need for an element of intuitive judgment. The “essential element in rational procedure in metaphysics” is to honestly face the logically possible alternatives and to weigh up the cost of accepting or rejecting them (Viney 1985, x).

Much of the global argument is anticipated in Hartshorne’s explanation and defense of neoclassical metaphysics (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). Consider an outline of Hartshorne’s cosmological argument. As noted above, Hartshorne argues that “Something exists” is necessarily true. The principle of contrast and Hartshorne’s defense of de re modality, if correct, imply that what exists is characterized by both contingency and necessity. The necessary, moreover, as the common element in all possibility, is abstract. If it is possible for this necessity to be divine—more precisely, the abstract pole of the divine—then it is possible for God to exist. This supports the weak premise of the modal argument that God’s existence is logically possible. To reject the conclusion, one must either deny the necessity of existence, the principle of contrast, de re modalities, the character of necessity as abstract, or the possibility that the necessary aspect of things is divine. Hartshorne’s cosmological argument differs from traditional versions in neither concluding to the existence of a prime mover, an uncaused cause, nor a wholly necessary being. Of course, none of these descriptions fits the dipolar God, and Hartshorne had no interest in defending them.

Causal principles enter Hartshorne’s cumulative case in his argument from cosmic order, which he calls “the design argument.” Hartshorne defends a metaphysic according to which the cosmos is a theater of interactions among dynamic singulars, all of which act and are acted upon. The existence of many real beings, thus defined, raises the problem of cosmic order. The question is not why there is order rather than mere chaos. For Hartshorne, chaos presupposes order as much as non-existence presupposes existence—indeed, mere chaos is indistinguishable from nonbeing. The question, rather, is how there can be order on a cosmic scale if there is only an uncoordinated set of centers of creative activity. Localized order, or order within the cosmos, can be explained by localized activity of entities within the cosmos. The order of the cosmos, however, cannot be the outcome of a coordinated effort by the many entities since their very existence, severally scattered throughout the cosmos, presupposes the cosmos as a field of activity. If there is a cosmic-ordering power that itself falls under the metaphysical principle of acting and being acted upon, then cosmic order can be explained. Moreover, as Hartshorne argues in A Natural Theology for Our Time, the explanation is not ad hoc since all real beings, localized ones and the cosmic-ordering power, fall under the same metaphysical principle. The cosmic-ordering power is not, in the words of Alfred North Whitehead, an exception to metaphysical principles, invoked to save their collapse, but is their chief exemplification.

Hartshorne allows that the expression “cosmic order” permits different values; the laws of nature must include constants as well as variables, and the values of the constants (for example, the speed of light), are not logical necessities. In this way, one may speak, with Whitehead, of different “cosmic epochs” in which the laws of nature beyond the singularities of our universe are not identical with our own. Hartshorne insists, however, that the problem of cosmic order remains. This is because our conceptions of the fundamental laws of nature are contingent and mathematically peculiar in character. For instance, an epoch such as our own with a law of gravitation specified by “mass times mass proportioned to the radius squared” is a particular nomological condition to be conceptually contrasted with, say, gravitation as “mass times mass proportioned to the radius cubed.” Basic laws of nature appear to have the logical earmarks of “contingent decrees,” and as such it is legitimate to ask for their causal explanations. Thought experiments which assert that such basic laws could be instituted by chance mechanisms beg the question of basic order. An example is Hume’s suggestion of an epicurean universe of swerving atoms that happen to arrange themselves into the cosmic “regularities” we observe. As Hartshorne says in A Natural Theology for Our Time, talk of atoms with a definite character persisting through time is “already a tremendous order.” Recent thought experiments in cosmology such as “bubble inflation” models also seem to posit background assumptions of contingent cosmic conditions, including the operating laws of quantum mechanics which necessarily involve specific quantitative values (for example, as in the use of Planck’s Constant).

On Hartshorne’s neoclassical theistic alternative, one arguably need not settle for any metaphysically inexplicable contingent cosmic order or a freedom-suppressing “necessitarian” universe. It is also well to remember that Hartshorne vigorously defends “indeterminism.” If determinism is false, then neither the order within the cosmos nor the order of the cosmos is absolute. Multiple real beings with varying degrees of creative power are a recipe for conflict. To be sure, the existence of multiple real beings also opens the possibility for cooperative endeavors, whether it is cooperation among or between localized beings and the cosmic designer; but multiple creativity guarantees a mixture of disharmony and harmony. The cosmic-ordering power can guarantee a cosmic order, but because of the existence of a plurality of real beings that act, and are not simply acted upon, not everything that happens can be chosen by a single individual, even a divine one. This is relevant to the problem of theodicy, for it shows that, in neoclassical metaphysics, the conflict of decisions among the creatures and between the creatures and God are possible, opening the way to tragedies that not even God can avoid.

A skeptic may embrace any of the options that Hartshorne denies, but at a cost. Hartshorne argues that each of the non-theistic options has dubious metaphysical credentials and that his solution to the problem of cosmic order is the most parsimonious. If there is no cosmic order one must explain the apparent success of science in discovering that order. If there is no cosmic-ordering power then either localized beings are being used to explain an order that their activity presupposes or there is no explanation of the order. Another atheistic option is to accept that there is a cosmic-ordering power but deny that it is divine. Hartshorne considered “panentheism” to provide a superior analogy to anything atheism can propose for the cosmic designer. However, the remaining three strands of the global argument can also be used to support the idea of such an ordering power; it is not only an agent causally affecting the world but is also affected by the world and incorporates it into the divine life, as one that perfectly knows the world (epistemic argument), perfectly preserves its achievements (moral argument), and fully appreciates the world (aesthetic argument).

In the epistemic argument, Hartshorne raises the question of the relation between reality and knowledge. In one respect, knowledge depends upon the real, for one cannot know what is not real. On the other hand, it is difficult to give an account of the real apart from some form of knowledge. As Hartshorne (Creative Synthesis 288) notes, Immanuel Kant suggested that appearance differs from reality because “ … the content of our sensory intuition differs from the content of a non-sensory intuition” (See also Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason, A249, A252). The object of the non-sensory intuition is the “noumenon.” (Hartshorne parts company with Kant in conceiving God’s knowledge as partly passive rather than as wholly active). Taking up Kant’s point, no merely partial or fallible knowing can circumscribe the real, for the extent of errors in knowing are measured by the real—if one is mistaken about x then something about x escapes one’s knowledge. In view of these conundrums, it is tempting to say that reality is the potential content of infallible knowledge—what an epistemically unsurpassable being would know if it existed. The problem with this solution, as far as atheism is concerned, is that an infallible knower, by definition, could not possibly be mistaken. However, it would know its own existence, so one is led to posit not simply the possible existence of an infallible knower, but also its actual existence. Hartshorne drew precisely this conclusion, that reality is the actual content of infallible knowledge. He argued further, following Josiah Royce, that defects in cognitive experience are internal to experience. Hartshorne mentions confusion, inconsistency, doubt, inconstancy of beliefs, and “above all, a lack of concepts adequate to interpret our percepts and of percepts adequate to distinguish between false and true concepts” (Creative Synthesis 288).

A distinctive feature of Hartshorne’s account of perfect knowledge is that it requires both cognitive and affective components (see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism,” part 5). God must be conceived not only as knowing all true propositions but also as knowing the creatures themselves; that is, feeling what they feel. Whatever one has been and however one has felt become transformed thereafter as an everlasting memory in God’s consciousness. This applies also to the collective life of the creatures. There is no mere numerical sum of value in God—as if value were simply a question of set membership—for the experiences of creatures become woven into the fabric of God’s undying experience. This is what Hartshorne means by “contributionism,” that the creatures enrich the divine life in a way that would not have been possible apart from their activity. In comments he made on a debate about the resurrection of Jesus, Hartshorne (Did Jesus Rise From the Dead? 140) asked, “If people can live or die for country, or other human groups, why can they not live and die for that which embraces all groups and their intrinsic values—the divine life?” Hartshorne was fond of quoting the Jewish prayer, “Help us to become co-workers with You, and endow our fleeting days with abiding worth.” The moral argument brings out the attractiveness of this ideal as the supreme aim of creaturely existence.

There are a number of ways to reject contributionism. One may deny that there is any supreme aim, theistic or nontheistic. Hartshorne argues that this robs comparative value judgments of a standard of comparison; if, as most reflective people would accept, it is possible to squander one’s life on trivial, unimportant, or immoral pursuits, then there must be a measure of the good life that is being used as a comparison. Another option is that self-interest is the supreme aim. Hartshorne follows the Buddhists in rejecting this (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). More plausible is the idea that the aim of life is to live for self and for others either during this life or in an afterlife. Hartshorne considered this laudable, but finally unsatisfactory as the supreme aim of life. First, he argued that there is at best a numerical meaning of “general welfare,” whereas neoclassical theism provides an experiential meaning in God’s experience. Second, there is the problem of mortality. In “A Free Man’s Worship,” Bertrand Russell stated the problem clearly when he proposed to build a philosophy of life upon a foundation of “unyielding despair.” The despair stems from the recognition that “the noonday brightness of human genius” and “the whole temple of man’s achievement” is destined to perish. There is, to be sure, apparent nobility in such Sisyphian labor, except that “nobility” and “tragedy” become, on this account, as if they had never been. Dipolar theism, on the other hand, accounts for the value of past achievement as an enduring aspect of the unending process of God’s life and memory. Moreover, the value of living for self and others is included in Hartshorne’s account, for the supreme “other” is God. The extent and nature of value that one contributes to God is precisely the extent and quality of value that one has contributed to others. Hartshorne argued that contributionism captures the inclusive nature of love that one finds expressed in biblical ethics: one cannot love God if one does not love others, and one is to love God with everything one is and to love one’s neighbor as oneself.

An argument from the beauty of the world as a de facto whole rounds out Hartshorne’s cumulative case and ties it to the aesthetic motif of his philosophy. It is quite natural, and prima facie rational, to speak of enjoying the beauty of the cosmos. Most people consider it appropriate to include aesthetic predicates in descriptions of the universe, for it is endlessly interesting, mysterious, and awe inspiring. Hartshorne described science as the search for the hidden beauty of the world, and many great scientists would agree; even those who have little or no use for philosophy or religion, like Steven Weinberg who states that the universe is beautiful beyond what seems necessary. An aesthetically displeasing universe, says Hartshorne, would be either chaotic or monotonous. What we find, on the contrary, is order in the laws of nature and variety in the evolution of new arrangements of matter and levels of mind. Hartshorne speaks of the world as a de facto whole, for he means to stress its open-ended and dynamic character. If atheism is true, then it is non-divine individuals alone that enjoy the beauty of the universe as a whole, catching a glimpse of it in the slice of time that is available to them and to the species. The peek that we have of the beauty of the cosmos, moreover, reveals horizons suggestive of aesthetic riches forever beyond our grasp. Hartshorne argues that this would represent an irremediable aesthetic defect in the universe, for beauty should be enjoyed and only God could adequately enjoy the beauty of the world as a whole. Of course, what should be is not necessarily what is. Hartshorne insists, however, that unlike merely contingent defects, the lack of a divine spectator would be a necessary defect, “an eternally necessary yet ugly aspect of things” (Creative Synthesis 290). It is a thought without intrinsic reward or pragmatic value, best conceived as a thought experiment whose purpose is to make us realize a divine mind that can appreciate the beauty that escapes us.

The conclusions of the design and epistemic arguments, together with Hartshorne’s “psychicalism,” lend support to his aesthetic argument. As the supreme cosmic-ordering power, whose knowledge is the ultimate measure of reality, the divine, in any particular state of its life, must find within itself the entire wealth of all creative experiencing that has ever existed. This experience of a universe in process is, as Whitehead says, “beyond our imagination to conceive”; it includes (to us) the imperceptible abyss of the past as well as the infinite possibilities of the future. It is here that these lines of inference dovetail with the moral argument. God must be conceived not only as the supreme spectator appreciating the beauty of the world as a de facto whole, but also as the supremely beautiful (or sublime) object of contemplation, adoration, and worship—an endlessly unfolding cosmic experience to which we contribute. Also implicit in Hartshorne’s theology is that God is, as it were, the supreme actor in the play of existence. The various roles of the deity, as Hartshorne conceives it, are neatly summarized in the title of one of his articles: “God as Composer-Director, Enjoyer, and, in a Sense, Player of the Cosmic Drama.”

3. The Problem of Evil and Theodicy

As long as there have been theists there has been a problem of evil, whether as a believer’s lament (as in Job), as a theologian’s conundrum (as in Augustine), or as a skeptic’s argument (as in Hume). Contemporary philosophers of religion speak of two forms of the problem of evil: the logical and the evidential. The logical problem of evil raises the question whether the existence of evil, conceived as gratuitous suffering, is logically consistent with the existence of a God that is perfect in power, knowledge, and goodness. The evidential problem of evil raises the question whether its existence renders improbable that of a perfect God. Hartshorne found neither version of the problem especially troublesome for his form of theism. He held that the problem with both versions of the problem of evil, as they are usually stated, is that they pose a loaded question, presupposing a concept of divine power that, in Hartshorne’s (Philosophical Aspects of Thanatology 86) words, “is not even coherent enough to be false.” Hartshorne developed and defended a metaphysic of shared creativity in which no individual, not even a divine one, can have a monopoly of power (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics” and “Dipolar Theism”). He was fond of disagreeing with Einstein who said that God does not play dice. On the contrary, chance and multiple freedom are inseparable; it is no accident, said Hartshorne (Studies in the Philosophy of J. N. Findlay 230), that there are accidents. Although God has the eminent form of creative power, it is not enough to guarantee a world without accidents, wrongdoing, and tragedy. Hartshorne would say that the evidential problem of evil suffers from the additional defect of assuming that God’s existence is an empirical question. We have seen that, according to Hartshorne, this represents a failure to appreciate the logical consequences of “Anselm’s discovery.”

Much of the appeal of traditional religion is that it offers the hope that the gulf between what is and what ought to be can be bridged in a future existence. It promises that the cosmic scales of justice are finally balanced either through the mysterious operations of karma in the process of reincarnation or through the omnipotence of God in a heavenly or hellish afterlife. Hartshorne considered these to be false hopes. While he did not definitively reject the possibility of an afterlife, he showed no interest in speculating about it or defending the idea. He argued that it is the divine prerogative alone to persist through infinite variations; the self-identity (that is, the genetic identity) of a non-divine individual cannot sustain itself indefinitely. Even if there were an afterlife, there could be no guarantee that the individual would survive long enough for every injustice, or even the greatest of injustices, in that person’s life to be rectified. Moreover, an afterlife could not eliminate the risk inherent in multiple or shared creativity. Traditional accounts of the afterlife are plausible only to the extent that creaturely freedom bends to a higher moral law (karma) or will (God’s) imposed on it. The heavens, hells, and purgatories of religion are elaborately orchestrated so as to place all lesser freedoms in perfect harmony with justice. In Hartshorne’s neoclassical metaphysics—especially evident in his design argument—God has the power to insure order on a cosmic scale, a power that is tantamount to insuring a field of activity for localized individuals. Divine power does not, however, extend to insuring what decisions the creatures will make. No particular outcome can be guaranteed.

To grant that the two versions of the problem of evil do not undermine neoclassical metaphysics, still leaves the question of God’s role regarding suffering and injustice. The facts that generate the problem of evil do not go away because one successfully rebuts a philosophical argument. Hartshorne claims that his theology makes better sense of “God is love” than its competitors, yet, there is a great deal of suffering that is undeserved, pointless, and widespread. Evolutionary theory adds another dimension. Entire ecosystems and countless species have come and gone in the course of geologic time. Throughout this history, creatures compete for the goods that will insure their survival and very often live at each other’s expense. Nature seems entirely indifferent to comparative values; as John B. Cobb Jr. noted, “lower” species thrive at the expense of “higher” species as when malarial mosquitoes feed on human beings. Finally, there are what Marilyn Adams calls “horrendous evils,” evils that are so pernicious that they give reason to doubt that the person’s life could be a great good to him or her on the whole. Hartshorne claims that a loving God is a necessary and indispensible character in this drama. One may ask whether this is plausible, but one must also take care not to permit the presuppositions of classical theism to color one’s judgment. Hartshorne counsels to be suspicious of the question whether our world is the sort that one would expect from an almighty and all-loving creator. In the context of dipolar theism the question must be rephrased: Is this the sort of world that one would expect of a deity that is perfect in power and love that presides over a world composed of beings, each of which exercises some degree of creativity?

If Hartshorne is correct, God accounts for order on a cosmic scale. There must be, however, two aspects to this activity that are distinguishable but not separable. On the one hand, there is the ordering activity that establishes the cosmic order per se, making possible all non-divine forms of freedom. On the other hand, there is the ordering activity that lures each localized being towards greater intensity of experience. Hartshorne holds that both aspects of God’s creative ordering of the world follow aesthetic principles (see “Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics”). According to these principles, the double extremes between which the divine ordering power operates are (1) unqualified unity and unqualified diversity (or chaos) and (2) ultra-complexity and ultra-simplicity (or triviality). The mere fact of an ordered cosmos does not automatically avoid the aesthetic defects of being overly chaotic or trivial. Avoidance of these extremes requires a cumulative developmental process, which is implicit in Hartshorne’s cumulative view of process. In neoclassical metaphysics, “the explanation for the contingent must be a genetic one,” as Hartshorne (82) says in Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers. It could not be everlastingly true that there have been elephants or seahorses. Because the process is cumulative, it must also be developmental. For example, an elephant is not created de novo from a mixture of atoms and molecules; it requires a lengthy process of species development. This is why Hartshorne claimed in Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes that the general idea of evolution is derivable from his metaphysical principles.

God’s role in the economy of nature is not simply maintaining cosmic order, but also eliciting higher forms of order, making possible forms of experience with greater levels of unity in diversity. A law of axiology as firm as any law of nature is that varying levels of creative experience are necessarily correlated with varying levels of what can be achieved in the way of value. For example, as complex and emotionally rich as a dog’s interior life may be, it is not sufficient to produce scientific theorizing or high artistic accomplishment. What follows is that varying levels of creativity exhibit varying levels of opportunity and risk. For instance, one cannot be ironic with a dog. Irony may amuse or offend only if one’s audience can understand it. As goes creative experiencing, so goes freedom. The cost of actual or possible achievement is the risk of failure. This analysis is evident in the few comments that Hartshorne made about sin. In a 1944 symposium on world peace, Hartshorne said that much could be learned from Reinhold Niebuhr that sin is not a struggle between “lower” (bodily) and “higher” (spiritual) aspects of personality. Rather, sin is a perversion of what is highest in a person, one’s sense of the divine; it is the claim to be divine, “a rebellion against our humble station in the universe” (Finkelstein and Maciever 597). This idolatry comes in many forms, religious and nonreligious, in the pernicious claims to infallibility or any attempt to place ultimate worth in something less than deity. As far as our experience goes, these are the highest and most tragic manifestations of the general principle that greater degrees of freedom necessarily accompany greater possibilities of its abuse.

Hartshorne agrees that the world is better to the extent that sin, and the suffering it brings in its wake, is not part of it. It does not follow, however, that the world is better to the extent that the possibility of sin is excluded from it. The conditions for the possibility of good or evil are the same: freedom. Indeed, Hartshorne maintained that some degree of evil is inevitable if good is to be possible. It is true that the particular evils that occur are not inevitable. Knowing this, we imagine that the cosmos could be altogether free of the blemish of evil, but this is to imagine an ideal that no single individual could bring about. One might agree with this but ask, with Hartshorne, whether there is a greater possibility of evil than might be expected from an all-loving cosmic designer. In The Zero Fallacy, Hartshorne spoke of human beings as the “bullies of the planet,” heedless of the welfare of other creatures, cruel to our own kind, and too often lacking the will to prevent such cruelty. He asked whether the seemingly unbridgeable distances between the earth and other solar systems might be a providential arrangement. In Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes, he allows himself an expression of doubt as to whether the “perilous experiment” of creatures free of instinctive guidance was too dangerous. He says that if he played at criticizing God, it would be at this point. Yet, Hartshorne also accepted on faith the infallible wisdom and ideal power of God. In Wisdom as Moderation, Hartshorne denies that limited intellects are in a position to know whether there is too much risk of evil in the world, for such a judgment must include a potentially infinite future. He also stressed that the justification of the world is in the world; that is, in the open-ended adventure of life itself that God’s creativity insures.

One of Hartshorne’s definitions of religion is the acceptance of our fragmentariness. We are fragmentary both in the sense that we are limited in space and time (that is, we are localized) and in the sense that our capacities for knowledge and goodness are limited (that is, we are imperfect). If something like Hartshorne’s panentheism is correct, we are also fragmentary in the sense that we are part of the divine being-in-becoming (see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism”). For Hartshorne, God includes all but does not determine all, much like a person includes the cells of his or her body without being able to decide the details of their activity. Thus, what we do makes a difference in and to God in the sense that we can enhance or diminish in admittedly limited ways the divine enjoyment of the world—hence, the concept of tragedy in God mentioned previously. We have also seen, in the moral argument, that Hartshorne regarded the aim of consciously contributing to the divine life as the highest purpose to which we can aspire. In Wisdom as Moderation, he says, “God’s possession of us is our final achievement, not our possession of God” (90). Every creature that has ever existed or will ever exist becomes part of the inexhaustible memory of God. In Plato’s Symposium, Socrates, reporting the views of Diotima, speaks of immortality as the achievement of doing acts worthy of future generations’ remembrance. Hartshorne offers a similar kind of immortality except that the fallible and mortal memory of future generations is replaced by the infallible and unending memory of God.

A Hartshornean theodicy does not allow one to say that everything, or every evil, happens for a reason. There is no cure for the fact that the “lower” sometimes lives at the expense of the “higher” and that horrendous evils are part of this universe. On the other hand, a Hartshornean theodicy allows one to say that anything that happens, or any evil that occurs, can become part of a reason for striving to overcome evil with good thereby depriving evil of its capacity to dishearten us. The true depth of divine power, on Hartshorne’s view, is not God’s ability to manipulate events to the best possible outcome, but to be able to bear the suffering of the creatures without being overcome by it. On Hartshorne’s view, God is forever seeking ways to bring good from the world no matter how bad things may get. The world-weariness that sometimes overcomes the creatures never overcomes deity. In the language of William James, Hartshorne’s God is neither a pessimist (thinking that things cannot get better) nor an optimist (thinking that things are for the best), but a kind of cosmic meliorist (thinking that things can get better). This theology may console in at least two ways. To those who are helpless and who suffer, Hartshorne claims that there is a divine co-sufferer. To those who are not helpless and who work for the welfare of others, Hartshorne maintains that they are indeed working on the side of the cosmos itself, as co-workers with God. This is what Pierre Teilhard de Chardin called “building the earth.” In this way, Hartshorne’s theism may promote a resilient spirit in the face of defeat, hope that may conquer despair, and love that holds the promise of harnessing evil.

4. Conclusion

Hartshorne’s extensive writings on the ontological argument were instrumental in generating new interest in Anselm’s reasoning and in redoubling the efforts of philosophers in exploring and evaluating the variations that it can take. By highlighting a second form of ontological argument—a modal version—that the vast majority of philosophers had ignored, Hartshorne demonstrated that it was no longer sufficient to rely on Gaunilo or Kant for a refutation of Anselm. Hartshorne benefited from the formalizations of modal systems made popular by his teacher C. I. Lewis, and was the first to publish a formalized version of the modal argument. This unprecedented accomplishment clarified the argument and helped turn attention to its modal structure.

One could argue that Hartshorne was a victim of his own success. As many philosophers had failed to read Anselm closely enough to discern a second argument in his Proslogion, so philosophers had a tendency not to read Hartshorne closely enough to understand that he never used the modal argument as a singular proof of theism. Hartshorne used the argument as a single strand in a cumulative or global argument for neoclassical theism. His way of presenting the elements of the global argument emphasized the rational cost of rejecting the premises that, in each case, Hartshorne argued, was greater than in accepting the conclusion. To be sure, Hartshorne considered the modal argument an essential strand in the case for theism since it reveals, he believed, the logic of theism. If Hartshorne is correct, empirical arguments for or against the existence of God are unavailing because they misconstrue the nature of the theistic question. This idea also extends to skeptical arguments from evil that conclude to either the non-existence or probable non-existence of God. The problems of theodicy, for Hartshorne, concern the presence of evil in a universe in which every concrete particular has some degree of creativity, and not, as in traditional theology, where creativity is the unique privilege of God.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. Books in Order of Publication Date

Hartshorne, Charles. 1941. Man’s Vision of God and the Logic of Theism. Chicago: Willett, Clark and Company.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1948. The Divine Relativity: A Social Conception of God. New Haven, Connecticut: Yale University Press.
Hartshorne, Charles and William L. Reese, eds. 1953. Philosophers Speak of God. Chicago: University of Chicago Press. Republished in 2000 by Humanity Books.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1962. The Logic of Perfection and Other Essays in Neoclassical Metaphysics. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1965. Anselm’s Discovery: A Re-examination of the Ontological Proof for God’s Existence. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. A Natural Theology for Our Time. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1983. Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers: An Evaluation of Western Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1997. The Zero Fallacy and Other Essays in Neoclassical Philosophy. Ed. Mohammad Valady. Peru, Illinois: Open Court Publishing Company.
Hartshorne, Charles. 2011. Creative Experiencing: A Philosophy of Freedom. Ed. Donald W. Viney and Jincheol O. Albany: State University of New York Press.

ii. Hartshorne’s Response to his Critics

Alston, William. 1964. “Interrogations of Charles Hartshorne.” Philosophical Interrogations. Eds. Sydney Rome and Beatrice Rome. New York: Holt, Rinehart and Winston: 319-54.
Cobb, John B. Jr. and Franklin L Gamwell, eds. 1984. Existence and Actuality: Conversations with Charles Hartshorne. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Hahn, Lewis Edwin, editor. 1991. The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers, Volume XX. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Kane, Robert and Stephen H. Phillips, eds. 1989. Hartshorne, Process Philosophy and Theology. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Sia, Santiago, ed. 1990. Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God: Philosophical and Theological Responses. Dordrecht, the Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers.

iii. Selected Articles

Hartshorne, Charles. 1944. “The Formal Validity and the Real Significance of the Ontological Argument.” The Philosophical Review 53.3: 225-45.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1945. “On Hartshorne’s Formulation of the Ontological Argument: A Rejoinder [to Elton].” Philosophical Review 54.1: 63-5.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1961. “The Logic of the Ontological Argument.” Journal of Philosophy 58.17: 471-73.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1962. Introduction. Saint Anselm: Basic Writings. 2nd ed. Trans. S. W. Deane. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court Publishing Company: 1-19.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1963. “Rationale of the Ontological Proof.” Theology Today 20.2: 278-83.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1966. “Is the Denial of Existence Ever Contradictory?” Journal of Philosophy 63.4: 85-93.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. “Necessity.” Review of Metaphysics 21.2: 290-96.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1967. “Rejoinder to Purtill.” Review of Metaphysics 21.2: 308-09.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1972. “Can There Be Proofs for the Existence of God?” Religious Language and Knowledge. Eds. Robert H. Ayers and William T. Blackstone. Athens: University of Georgia Press: 62-75.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1977. “John Hick on Logical and Ontological Necessity.” Religious Studies 13.2: l55-65.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1978. “A Philosophy of Death” Philosophical Aspects of Thanatology. Vol. 2. Eds. Florence M. Hetzler and A. H. Kutscher. New York: MSS Information Corp.: 81- 89.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1982. “Grounds for Believing in God’s Existence.” Meaning, Truth, and God. Ed. Leroy S. Rouner. London: University of Notre Dame Press: 17-33.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. “God and the Meaning of Life.” On Nature. Vol. 6. Ed. Leroy S. Rouner. Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press: 154-68.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1985a. “Theistic Proofs and Disproofs: The Findlay Paradox.” Studies in the Philosophy of J. N. Findlay. Eds. Robert S. Cohen, Richard M. Martin, and Merold Westphal. Albany: State University of New York Press: 224-34.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1985b. “Our Knowledge of God.” Knowing Religiously. Vol. 7. Ed. Leroy S. Rouner. Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press: 52-63.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1987. “Response to resurrection debate.” Did Jesus Rise From the Dead? The Resurrection Debate. Ed. Terry L. Miethe. San Francisco: Harper & Row: 137-42.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1989. “Metaphysical and Empirical Aspects of the Idea of God.” Witness and Existence: Essays in Honor of Schubert M. Ogden. Eds. Philip E. Devenish and George L. Goodwin. Chicago: University of Chicago Press: 177-189.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1999. “Can We Understand God?” Framing a Vision of the World: Essays in Philosophy, Science and Religion. Eds. André Cloots and Santiago Sia. Belgium: Leuven University Press: 87-97.

b. Secondary Sources

Boyd, Gregory A. 1992. Trinity and Process: A Critical Evaluation and Reconstruction of Hartshorne’s Di-Polar Theism Towards a Trinitarian Metaphysics. New York: Peter Lang.
Burrell, David B. 1982. “Does Process Theology Rest on a Mistake?” Theological Studies 43.1: 125-35.
Clarke, Bowman. 1971. “Modal Disproofs and Proofs for God.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 9.3: 247-58.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 1996. Analytic Theism, Hartshorne, and the Concept of God. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 2006. Rethinking the Ontological Argument: A Neoclassical Theistic Response. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Finkelstein, Louis and Robert M. Maciever, eds. 1944. Approaches to World Peace: A Symposium. New York: Conference on Science, Philosophy, and Religion in their Relation to the Democratic Way of Life.
Goodwin, George L. 1978. The Ontological Argument of Charles Hartshorne. Missoula: Montana Scholars Press.
Goodwin, George L. 1983. “The Ontological Argument in Neoclassical Context: Reply to Friedman.” Erkenntnis 20: 219-32.
Goodwin, George L. 2003. “De Re Modality and the Ontological Argument.” Process and Analysis: Whitehead, Hartshorne, and the Analytic Tradition. Ed. George W. Shields. Albany: State University of New York Press: 175-97.
Kane, Robert. 1984. “The Modal Ontological Argument.” Mind 93: 336-50.
Lucas, Billy Joe. 2003. “The Second Epistemic Way.” Process and Analysis: Whitehead, Hartshorne, and the Analytic Tradition. Ed. George W. Shields. Albany: State University of New York Press: 199-207.
Neville, Robert C. 1980. Creativity and God: A Challenge to Process Theology. New York: The Seabury Press.
Neville, Robert C. 2009. Realism in Religion: A Pragmatist’s Perspective. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Oppy, Graham. 1995. Ontological Arguments and Belief in God. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Peirce, C. S. 1934. The Collected Papers of Charles Sanders Peirce. Vol. 5, Eds. Charles Hartshorne and Paul Weiss. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Peters, Eugene H. 1970. Hartshorne and Neoclassical Metaphysics. Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
Peters, Eugene H. 1984. “Charles Hartshorne and the Ontological Argument.” Process Studies 14.1: 11-20.
Shields, George W. 1980. “Review of The Ontological Argument of Charles Hartshorne by George L. Goodwin.” The Journal of Religion 60.3: 357-59.
Shields, George W. 1980. “Hartshorne’s Modal Ontological Argument.” Dialogue 22.1-2: 45-56.
Shields, George W. 1983. “God, Modality and Incoherence.” Encounter 44.1: 27-39.
Shields, George W. 1992. “Hartshorne and Creel on Impassibility,” Process Studies 21.1: 44-59.
Shields, George W. 1992. “Infinitesimals and Hartshorne’s Set-Theoretic Platonism” The Modern Schoolman 49.2: 123-134.
Shields, George W., ed. 2003. Process and Analysis: Whitehead, Hartshorne, and the Analytic Tradition. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Sia, Santiago. 1985. God in Process Thought: A Study in Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God. Dordrecht, the Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff.
Sia, Santiago. 2004. Religion, Reason and God: Essays in the Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne and A. N. Whitehead. Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang.
Sia, Santiago, ed. 1986. Word and Spirit, a Monastic Review, 8: Process Theology and the Christian Doctrine of God. Petersham, Massachusetts: St. Bede’s Publications.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 1985. Charles Hartshorne and the Existence of God. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 1986. “How to Argue for God’s Existence: Reflections on Hartshorne’s Global Argument.” The Midwest Quarterly 28.1: 36-49.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 1987. “In Defense of the Global Argument: A Reply to Professor Luft.” Process Studies 16.4: 309-311.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2005. “A Lamp to Our Doubts: Ferré, Hartshorne, and Theistic Arguments.” Nature, Truth, and Value: Exploring the Thinking of Frederick Ferré. Eds. George Allan and Merle F. Allshouse. Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books: 255-69.
Whitney, Barry L. 1985. Evil and the Process God. Toronto: Edwin Mellon Press.
Wilcox, John T. 1961. “A Question from Physics for Certain Theists.” Journal of Religion 40.4: 293-300.
Wood, Forest Jr. and Michael DeArmey, eds. 1986. Hartshorne’s Neo-Classical Theology. New Orleans: Tulane University Press.

c. Bibliography

Viney, Donald Wayne and Randy Ramal. 2007. “Primary Bibliography of Philosophical Works of Charles Hartshorne.” Hartshorne: A New World View: Essays by Charles Hartshorne. Ed. in Herbert F. Vetter. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard Square Library: 129-160. Also published in Sia, Santiago. 2004. Religion, Reason and God. Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang: 195-223.

Author Information

Donald Wayne Viney
Email: don_viney@yahoo.com
Pittsburg State University
U. S. A.

and

George W. Shields
Email: George.shields@kysu.edu
Kentucky State University
U. S. A.

Reformed Epistemology

Reformed epistemology is a thesis about the rationality of religious belief. A central claim made by the reformed epistemologist is that religious belief can be rational without any appeal to evidence or argument. There are, broadly speaking, two ways that reformed epistemologists support this claim. The first is to argue that there is no way to successfully formulate the charge that religious belief is in some way epistemically defective if it is lacking support by evidence or argument. The second way is to offer a description of what it means for a belief to be rational, and to suggest ways that religious beliefs might in fact be meeting these requirements. This has led reformed epistemologists to explore topics such as when a belief-forming mechanism confers warrant, the rationality of engaging in belief forming practices, and when we have an epistemic duty to revise our beliefs. As such, reformed epistemology offers an alternative to evidentialism (the view that religious belief must be supported by evidence in order to be rational) and fideism (the view that religious belief is not rational, but that we have non-epistemic reasons for believing).

Reformed epistemology was first clearly articulated in a collection of papers called Faith and Rationality edited by Alvin Plantinga and Nicholas Wolterstorff in 1983. However, the view owes a debt to many other thinkers.

Introduction
The Origins of Reformed Epistemology
1. Reformed
2. Epistemology
Key Figures in Reformed Epistemology
Evidence and Rational Belief in God
Classical Foundationalism
1. Rejecting Classical Foundationalism
The Positive Case in Reformed Epistemology
Objections to Reformed Epistemology
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Here is an argument against the rationality of belief in God:

(1) Belief in God requires the right kind of evidence in order to be rational.

(2) No such evidence exists for belief in God.

(3) Therefore, belief in God is not rational.

The idea here is that in order for belief in God to be rational, there needs to be an appropriate relationship between belief and evidence. What is appropriate, according to those who endorse the above argument, is that the belief in question be based on good evidence. This argument is sometimes referred to as the evidentialist objection to believe in God. According to the reformed epistemologist, philosophers have historically taken premise 1 to be rather intuitive. As a result, discussion involving the rationality of belief in God focused almost entirely on premise 2. Thus, philosophers who defended the rationality and justification of belief in God would have done so by responding to premise 2 and providing evidence for God’s existence. The evidentialist objection fails, they claim, because sufficient evidence does exist for rational belief in God. According to the reformed epistemologist, then, theists (historically anyway) who reject premise 2 would simply endorse the following argument:

(1) Belief in God requires the right kind of evidence in order to be rational.

(2*) Such evidence does exist for rational belief in God.

(3*) Therefore, belief in God is rational.

For the theist who defends this argument, finding the right kind of evidence that is sufficient for rational belief in God becomes their chief aim. The problem, according to the reformed epistemologist, is that such a move is unnecessary. There is, in other words, a much easier way around the evidentialist objection—the rejection of premise 1. Thus, for the reformed epistemologist the problem with the evidentialist objection lies not with 2, but with 1. Why assume that belief in God is in any way subject to the demands of 1? Belief in God, argues the reformed epistemologist, can be rational without inference from evidence or argument. If this central claim is true, 1 is undermined and the evidentialist objection (as it stands) fails.

2. The Origins of Reformed Epistemology

Reformed epistemology first appeared in the early 1980s but the view owes a debt to many other thinkers. The influences on reformed epistemology can be divided into two groups: reformed influences and influences from within epistemology.

a. Reformed

Reformed epistemology was first clearly articulated in a collection of papers called Faith and Rationality edited by Alvin Plantinga and Nicholas Wolterstorff in 1983. The reason for “reformed” in reformed epistemology is a result of the clear influences from the reformed theological tradition on this view. Two of the leading proponents—Plantinga and Wolterstorff—taught at Calvin College and they take inspiration from important reformed thinkers such as John Calvin and Abraham Kuyper.

The most explicit appeal to the reformed tradition is found in Alvin Plantinga’s work. Plantinga, when wondering how theistic belief might be grounded, suggests that we consider that Calvin may have been right when he said that God has created humans with an inner awareness of himself and it is this sensus divinitatis that is responsible for theistic belief. Plantinga also engages with and criticizes reformed thinkers who reject natural theology such as Karl Barth (See Plantinga 1983).

Despite the important role that reformed thought has played in the early days of reformed epistemology, and, in particular, in the thinking of some of its key proponents, the central tenets of reformed epistemology do not depend on this tradition. Plantinga has tried to make this more explicit. In Warrant and Christian Belief he argues that the ideas he finds in Calvin are also found in Thomas Aquinas. In fact, there is no reason to believe that there won’t be numerous traditions within Christian thought that could also adopt something like the view defended by reformed epistemologists. Furthermore, the view could be easily adapted by other religions—particularly monotheistic religions.

In light of this, the word “reformed” in reformed epistemology is best thought of as describing the inspiration behind the position rather than its core claims. Objections to reformed thought, or to Christianity more generally, may leave reformed epistemology unscathed.

b. Epistemology

As well as being influenced by the reformed tradition, reformed epistemology draws on work in epistemology. The philosopher who has most clearly been influential to reformed epistemologists is Thomas Reid, a Scottish Presbyterian minister. Reid’s epistemology is distinctive because of the importance he places on describing the belief forming faculties that give rise to our beliefs. These faculties are dispositions to form certain beliefs in response to being triggered in certain ways. These dispositions can vary over time and we can gain some and lose others through training or habit. But some of our belief dispositions are innate—we are simply born with them. According to Reid these innate dispositions cannot ultimately be rationally grounded by us, but we must rely on them nonetheless.

This Reidian picture of epistemology has had a significant influence on reformed epistemology. Accordingly, reformed epistemologists argue that in order to understand whether or not our religious beliefs are rational we must consider what sorts of being we are and the innate belief dispositions that we have.

3. Key Figures in Reformed Epistemology

Though perhaps not a sufficient condition, the rejection of premise 1 above is at least a necessary condition when it comes to identifying key figures within reformed epistemology. Below, then, we discuss three philosophers who reject the idea that belief in God is rational only when inferred from good evidence. These philosophers—William Alston, Alvin Plantinga, and Nicholas Wolterstorff—are key figures within religious epistemology and were central in the development of reformed epistemology.

a. William Alston

William Alston’s first major contribution to reformed epistemology comes in a pair of essays “Religious Experience and Religious Belief” and “Christian Experience and Christian Belief” (the latter of these appears in Faith and Rationality, which is edited by Alvin Plantinga and Nicholas Wolterstorff). His aim is to argue that Christian Practice (CP) is justified. CP is the practice of forming certain kinds of beliefs in response to certain experiences. The sorts of beliefs in question are those such as “God will provide for his people” or “God will forgive the sins of the truly repentant.” They are beliefs about God and his activities and Alston calls these beliefs “M-beliefs” where M stands for manifestation (Alston 1983: 104-105).

Alston wishes to show that those who engage in CP are justified in much the same way that we are justified in engaging in a different practice—perceptual practice (PP). PP is the very familiar practice of forming certain perceptual beliefs in response to perceptual experiences.

Alston argues that there is no non-circular justification available for PP; this is because our only access to the physical world, that PP gives us knowledge of, is through PP itself. The only justification we have for PP is that we do not have sufficient reason for believing that it is unreliable. CP, claims Alston, is justified by the same standard. Those who claim that we need some independent reason for trusting CP are holding it to a higher epistemic standard than PP.

Alston went on to offer a book-length defense of these ideas in Perceiving God. In Perceiving God Alston spends significant time discussing objections to what he is now calling Christian Mystical Practice (CMP). He concludes that all the objections fail and that they are guilty of one of two things: epistemic imperialism or double standards. He describes epistemic imperialism as requiring that CMP be like PP in some way, if it is to be justified, without any epistemic support for that requirement. Objections are guilty of double standards when they seek to apply a standard to CMP that PP would not meet (Alston 1991: 248-250).

b. Alvin Plantinga

Alvin Plantinga has authored and edited a number of books and essays on reformed epistemology. Plantinga’s earliest work on the topic, God and Other Minds, represents an initial attempt to undermine the evidentialist objection. In God and Other Minds, Plantinga assumes that (2) is generally correct. There isn’t, according to Plantinga, sufficiently good evidence for belief in God—at least not in the way that is demanded by the evidentialist. Plantinga’s approach at this point, then, is to argue that there is a double standard with regard to (1). So while the evidence and arguments for belief in God are far from conclusive, they are, in fact, on par with other beliefs that we take to be rational. For example, as the argument goes, we take the belief that other minds exist to be rational despite the fact that philosophical arguments in its favor suffer many of the same problems that plague traditional theistic arguments. Thus, concludes Plantinga, “if my belief in other minds is rational, so is my belief in God. But obviously the former is rational; so, therefore, is the latter” (1967: 271). This is the first of Plantinga’s so called parity arguments.

In more recent literature, however, Plantinga abandons this earlier parity argument as a way to deal with the evidentialist objector. This is due in part to the fact that in God and Other Minds Plantinga assumed, like the evidentialist objector, that the way to go about discussing the rationality of religious belief was to first consider the evidence in its favor. Here is Plantinga discussing this assumption:

I was somehow both accepting but also questioning what was then axiomatic: that belief in God, if it is to be rationally acceptable, must be such that there is good evidence for it. This evidence would be propositional evidence: evidence from other propositions you believe, and it would have to come in the form of arguments. This claim wasn’t itself argued for: it was simply asserted, or better, just assumed as self-evident or at least utterly obvious. What was taken for granted has now come to be called ‘evidentialism’ (a better title would be ‘evidentialism with respect to belief in God’, but that’s a bit unwieldy). (2000: 70)

Plantinga, then, initially attempted to confront the evidentialist objection by merely pointing out its inconsistent nature. In more recent literature, however, Plantinga adopts a new, bolder approach in response to the evidentialist objection. He directly confronts the evidentialist by showing that it is motivated by a failed theory of justification—namely, classical foundationalism. Crucial to the argument, then, is the belief that the evidentialist objection arises from the influence of classical foundationalism. A detailed response to classical foundationalism is found in chapter 3 of Warranted Christian Belief. The idea presented in WCB is not that (1) is applied inconsistently, but that there is no good reason to think that (1) is true.

As well as this negative approach to challenging the evidentialist objection Plantinga also seeks to offer something more positive. In his book, Warrant and Proper Function, Plantinga seeks to offer an account of warrant—his term for whatever it is that makes the difference between true belief and knowledge. In Warranted Christian Belief Plantinga applies his account of warrant to religious belief and argues that there is no way to show that religious belief is not warranted without first assuming that it is false.

c. Nicolas Wolterstorff

Nicholas Wolterstorff’s defense of some of the central claims of reformed epistemology is perhaps less significant than the previous two figures that we looked at, but his contributions are certainly more wide reaching. His earliest contribution is his book Reason within the Bounds of Religion. In this book Wolterstorff is grappling with the question of how to be a Christian and a scholar and how one’s faith ought to relate to and impact upon one’s reasoning. Though we find no explicit formulation of reformed epistemology here, it is clear that he is attempting to develop a view in which religious beliefs are neither subordinate to nor independent of our other beliefs.

His most explicit contribution to reformed epistemology comes in the collection of essays that he edited with Alvin Plantinga called Faith and Rationality. In his paper entitled “Can belief in God be rational?” he considers what obligations rationality places upon us, and in particular whether rationality requires that we only believe in God on the basis of evidence. Wolterstorff argues that:

A person is rationally justified in believing a certain proposition which he does believe unless he has adequate reason to cease from believing it. Our beliefs are rational unless we have reason for refraining; they are not nonrational unless we have reason for believing. They are innocent until proved guilty, not guilty until proved innocent. (Wolterstorff 1983: 163)

He then turns to applying this to belief in God. He observes that people come to believe that God exists in a variety of ways such as from their parents, or in response to an overwhelming sense of guilt, or by finding peace in the midst of suicidal desperation. In many cases, belief in God seems to be immediate (that is, not based upon other beliefs) and so long as the person who forms the belief has no adequate reason to give up their belief then that belief will be rational.

More recent contributions from Wolterstorff come in his books Divine Discourse and Justice. In the former he is engaged in a philosophical discussion of the claim that God speaks, and in the latter, he is defending an account of human rights. Although these books are not about reformed epistemology they are informed by it. Wolterstorff is still engaged in showing how certain religious beliefs can be rational. Furthermore, Wolterstorff is clearly putting into practice some of the key claims of reformed epistemology. In Justice it is clear that Wolterstorff is seeking to show how some religious claims interact with the discussion of human rights—in doing this, Wolterstorff treats the religious claims as standing on equal footing with the non-religious claims. What this means in practice is that he does not attempt to justify religious claims on grounds acceptable to the non-religious, but neither does he treat religious claims as immune to criticism.

4. Evidence and Rational Belief in God

According to the reformed epistemologist, objections to the rationality of belief in God often revolve around the claim that belief in God lacks the appropriate evidence. In order to see this, we can, following Plantinga, identify two distinct types of objections—namely, the de facto and de jure objections. The de facto objection, historically anyway, is the form many religious objections traditionally take. That is, the religious skeptic often questions the reality or truth of the religious conviction before directly considering epistemic questions. De facto objections take many forms, with perhaps the problem of evil being the most well-known and discussed in philosophical literature. As the argument goes, a benevolent and omnipotent God cannot possibly exist given the amount of unnecessary or gratuitous evil.

In contrast to the de facto objection, there is an epistemic objection—or as Plantinga calls it, the de jure objection. The de jure objection ignores the ontological status of God’s existence and instead focuses on the justification and rationality of belief in God. The de jure objector asks whether belief in God is irrational, unjustifiable, or epistemically irresponsible. This objection comes in various forms as well. For some, belief in God is irrational as it is the result of some cognitive malfunction. Belief in God is so irrational, it is claimed, that it could have only been invented by mad, deluded people who base their belief on insufficient justification or argument. For others, this cognitive malfunction is akin to belief in Santa Claus and not the kind of belief an adult could justifiably believe in. Belief in Santa Claus, for which there is no evidence, is akin to belief in God, for which there is no evidence. No matter which line the de jure objector takes, what seems to unite these objectors is the idea that belief in God lacks the kind of epistemic justification necessary for rational belief. And for many de jure objectors there is the assumption, as Plantinga notes, that having a rational belief in God requires (propositional) evidence in order to have adequate epistemic support. Call this the evidentialist de jure objection. So what motivates the de jure objection, then, is the idea that belief in God both requires and lacks the appropriate evidence. The central claim of the evidentialist position is that one ought to believe only when one has the appropriate evidence. Thus if theism is indeed similar to belief in Santa Claus (for which there is no good evidence), then it seems that belief in God is indeed dubious and the nature of the evidentialist de jure objection becomes a bit clearer: belief in God is rational only if its justification depends on evidence. Theism, however, lacks the appropriate evidence and is therefore irrational.

What makes reformed epistemology unique here is the response that is given in reply to this critcism. The assumed move here would be to try and show that there is adequate evidence for theism. Instead, though, the reformed epistemologist rejects the evidentialist assumption (and on some accounts might even grant that there is insufficient inferential evidence). While there are perhaps several ways to get around the evidentialist assumption, the most well-known account is offered by Plantinga. Plantinga argues, for example, that the evidentialist assumption is undermined given that it is motivated by a failed theory of justification—namely, classical foundationalism.

5. Classical Foundationalism

In order to undermine the evidentialist objection, reformed epistemologists have sought to argue against what they take to be the underlying epistemological view that motivates the objection. The view that they identify as playing this role they call Classical Foundationalism.

Classical Foundationalism holds that there are two kinds of belief: basic beliefs and non-basic beliefs. The basic beliefs are rational even when not held on the basis of other beliefs, whereas non-basic beliefs are only rational when supported by basic beliefs. The reason why classical foundationalism motivates the evidentialist objection against belief in God is because of the restrictions it puts on what can reasonably be a basic belief—on what is a properly basic belief.

According to the classical foundationalist, the only beliefs that are properly basic fall into to one of the three following categories:

evident to the senses,

incorrigible, or

self-evident.

This means that any belief that does not fall into one of these categories can only be rational if it is supported by beliefs that do fall into these categories. With this framework in place it seems quite easy to formulate the evidentialist objection against belief in God. This is because belief in God does not seem to be evident to the sense, incorrigible or self-evident. Given this, then, we can claim that belief in God is only rational if it is supported by adequate evidence—that is, by other beliefs that are evident to the senses, incorrigible or self-evident.

It is possible to find historical examples of arguments along these lines. For example, here is J. L. Mackie discussing the rationality of belief in God:

If it is agreed that the central assertions of theism are literally meaningful, it must also be admitted that they are not directly verifiable. It follows then that any rational consideration of whether they are true or not will involve arguments… it [whether God exists] must be examined by either deductive or inductive reasoning or, if that yields no decision, by arguments to the best explanation; for in such a context nothing else can have any coherent bearing on the issue. (Mackie 1982: 4, 6)

Mackie is not alone is these demands. John Locke placed similar demands on religious belief by boldly claiming that those who do assent to (religious) belief without evidence “transgress against their own light” and disregard the very purpose of those faculties which are designed to evaluate the evidence necessary for belief.

The reformed epistemologist contends that this view has been the dominant one among both theists and atheists alike, and so the question of whether or not belief in God is rational has focused on whether or not there is adequate evidence for that belief. It is for this reason that reformed epistemologists have seen their first task as being to show why classical foundationalism fails as account of what it takes for a belief to be rational.

a. Rejecting Classical Foundationalism

The case for rejecting classical foundationalism rests on two key arguments. First, classical foundationalism classes a large number of beliefs that we typically take ourselves to know as irrational. Second, classical foundationalism is self-referentially incoherent.

The first problem raised against classical foundationalism is that it classes beliefs such as ‘the world has existed for more than five minutes’, ‘other persons exist’ and ‘humans can act freely’ as not properly basic. These beliefs, claims Plantinga, (along with a great many others) are accepted by the vast majority of rational humans; yet, the arguments for these beliefs are remarkably weak. Most people who believe these things can offer no arguments for their belief, and those who can, still seem to hold the belief with a greater degree of certainty than the argument would seem to warrant. Plantinga writes that the problem of other minds is to explain how it is that the very common belief that other humans have a mental life could be justified. Plantinga thinks that the best argument is the argument from analogy—that we observe that our own mental events such as being in pain are accompanied by certain behaviors, such as grasping the area where the pain is located, and then infer from this that when others are exhibiting similar behavior, they are also having the associated mental event. This inference from a single case hardly seems to justify the belief that there are other minds, but if it can be shown to be sufficient it would still be implausible to claim that only those who have knowledge of the argument are rational in their belief that other minds exist. This, perhaps, would not be so troubling if it were not the case that so many beliefs that do not meet the requirements set down by classical foundationalism are believed in a basic way by most rational humans. Anthony Kenny has pointed out that there are many beliefs that, although we can find some evidence for them, should not be thought of as being based upon that evidence because the evidence is believed with less strength than what it is evidence for. He suggests that the belief that Australia exists is just such a belief:

If any one of the ‘reasons’ for believing in Australia turned out to be false, even if all the considerations I could mention proved illusory, much less of my noetic structure would collapse than if it turned out that Australia did not exist. (Kenny 1983: 19)

The same goes for beliefs such as ‘I am awake’ or ‘human beings die’. If these beliefs can be rational only if they are based upon evidence then the classical foundationalism seems to suggest that we should hold many of our beliefs with much less certainty, and give up many other very strongly held beliefs.

Plantinga’s second objection is that classical foundationalism is self-referentially incoherent. Classical foundationalism itself is not self-evident, neither is it incorrigible, and it is certainly not evident to the senses. This means that if it is to meet its own standards there must be an argument from premises that are self-evident, incorrigible, or evident to the senses. No argument presents itself, and it is certainly difficult to see where one would start, especially in light of some of the counterintuitive consequences of the classical foundationalism highlighted above.

It’s worth noting here that not all reformed epistemologists think the connection between classical foundationalism and evidentialism is so obvious. There are two main lines of criticism that can be made to Plantinga’s arguments against classical foundationalism. The first is to question the link between classical foundationalism and the evidentialist objection, and the second is to claim that Plantinga has failed to show that classical foundationalism is an untenable position.

This first criticism can be found among Plantinga’s fellow reformed epistemologists:

[I]f [Plantinga] is saying that no one has explicitly presented [the evidentialist objection] as following from some other developed and articulated position that is probably true, but it remains to be shown that anyone has done that with respect to classical foundationalism either. But if the claim is that no other epistemological theory could plausibly serve as a reason for the evidentialist denial, that is palpably false. (Alston in Tomberlin and van Inwagen 1985: 296)

[Plantinga’s] discussion puts us in the position of seeing that the most common and powerful argument for evidentialism is classical foundationalism, and of seeing that classical foundationalism is unacceptable. But to deprive the evidentialist of his best defense is not yet to show that his contention is false. (Wolterstorff 1983: 142)

The criticism from Alston and Wolterstorff is that Plantinga has done nothing to persuade us that the evidentialist objection has no force; at best he has shown that no previous articulation of the objection is successful (supposing that it is correct that all previous versions of the argument rely on something very much like classical foundationalism).

The second response to Plantinga can again be found in Alston (Alston in Tomberlin and van Inwagen 1985: 296-299). Alston observes that Plantinga has not shown that the defender of classical foundationalism cannot argue for classical foundationalism from premises that are properly basic by her lights. Alston agrees that it is hard to see how this might be done but denies that this supports the conclusion that it cannot be done.

Plantinga’s critique of classical foundationalism noted above might be understood as a negative approach. The responses from Alston and Wolterstorff, then, are directed at this negative approach. Plantinga, however, also offers a different, more positive approach to the issue of proper basicality. He asks us to reconsider what might be classified as properly basic. Rather than select criteria, and then categorize our beliefs accordingly, we should amass examples of beliefs that we take to be properly basic, and the circumstances in which they are considered properly basic. After this process, Plantinga suggests that one could then propose criteria following reflection on these examples. Though, it’s important to keep in mind that not all of the example beliefs will qualify as genuinely properly basic (despite any initial appearances to the contrary).

But who is to decide the set of examples, and how do we weed out bad examples without any criteria? Plantinga deliberately gives no definitive answers to these questions. According to Plantinga, it is the responsibility of each community to decide what it considers to be properly basic and to take that as a starting point; there can then be an exchange between the examples and the criteria that they are used to justify, each refining the other. The claim is not that those beliefs that are held by one’s own community to be properly basic are properly basic; rather, the claim is that this is the best starting point for enquiry. It may be that your community has got it wrong about what beliefs are properly basic, but hopefully this will be revealed by further reflection.

According the reformed epistemologist, there is no neutral starting point for philosophical enquiry, so it is up to each community to assess their own starting point, and take that as a defeasible foundation for inquiry. Communities are not free, however, to decide what beliefs are basic for them. What we believe is rarely within our own control—for example, one cannot simply decide to believe that the moon does not exist. This means that there is an objective fact about what each community does take as its starting point.

It might be objected that this is arbitrary, but Plantinga contends that there is no set of beliefs that will be entirely uncontroversial, and there is no criteria of proper basicality that is more convincing than the beliefs that most people take as properly basic. Or perhaps some will agree that although this method is correct, it is still implausible that belief in God should be properly basic. In the case of perceptual beliefs the ground for them is obvious, even if how they are grounded is not clear. God, if he exists, is surely much more remote, and his existence is not the sort of thing that can be known in the basic way.

Plantinga responds by pointing out that, within the Reformed tradition at least, belief in God is considered to be grounded. According to John Calvin, one of the important figures in the Reformation, humans each have a natural tendency to believe that God exists when placed in certain circumstances, in fact he claims that God “daily discloses himself in the whole workmanship of the universe” (Plantinga 2000: 66). Plantinga does not argue for the truth of such a position, rather, he mentions it to show that his claim that belief in God can be properly basic is not ad hoc, but is in fact implicitly the view held by a large number of people, and the Reformed tradition more specifically. It is not necessary that Plantinga know, or even have good reason to believe the claims made by Calvin and others, as long as it is true that there are experiences that serve to ground belief in God then that belief will be properly basic on those occasions. It is due to this appeal to reformed thinkers that this view has come to be known as reformed epistemology.

On the surface, reformed epistemology bears some similarity to fideism. Fideism is the claim that belief in God is not rational, but must be accepted upon faith; it is usually claimed that this belief is independent of reason, or in more extreme cases that it is opposed to reason. The reformed epistemologist will agree with the fideist that arguments are not needed to justify belief in God, but what about the relationship between reason and belief in God?

It is clear from what has already been discussed that the reformed epistemologist will not subscribe to the more extreme fideism because to believe what is properly basic is not to believe what is opposed to reason. What is, at first, less clear is whether to believe in God in the basic way is to believe independently of reason. Plantinga considers a distinction between reason and faith suggested by Abraham Kuyper (Plantinga 1983: 88), that the deliverances of reason are those beliefs that are based on argumentation and inference, whereas the deliverances of faith are beliefs that are held independently of argument and inference. On this understanding of faith, anything held in the basic way will be taken on faith. For example, this definition would suggest that 2+1=3, external objects exist and I am awake, are all held on faith. This is not the understanding of faith that the fideist has in mind, since it does not serve to draw a distinction between faith and reason. Plantinga explains that there is no reason for the reformed epistemologist to think that belief in God is independent of, or opposed to, reason:

Belief in the existence of God is in the same boat as belief in other minds, the past, and perceptual objects; in each case God has so constructed us that in the right circumstances we form the belief in question. But then the belief that there is such a person as God is as much among the deliverances of reason as other beliefs. (Plantinga 1983: 90)

Reformed epistemologists, unlike fideists, hold that religious belief is rational, but unlike the evidentialist, they deny that this rationality is due to the beliefs being based upon evidence.

6. The Positive Case in Reformed Epistemology

So far, much of what has been said here has been focused on undermining a certain sort objection to the rationality of religious belief. The second significant strand to reformed epistemology concerns providing a description of the way in which religious beliefs can be rational.

a. The Christian Mystical Practice

In Perceiving God William Alston seeks to describe and defend what he calls the Christian Mystical Practice (CMP). This is the practice of forming beliefs about God in response to certain kinds of experiences.

Alston first argues that there are no non-question-begging way to show that any basic belief forming practice is reliable—one will always have to appeal to the practice itself. In light of this we cannot require that belief forming practices enjoy independent support before we engage in them because this support will never be available. It may be that some practices can be ruled out due to being inconsistent, but no adequate reason can be found for thinking that any of our basic belief forming practices are reliable.

Instead Alston argues that it is reasonable to accept socially established practices; those practices that have demonstrated stability over a number of generations and which are deeply embedded in our psyche. Such practices provide prima facie justification for the beliefs that they produce. Furthermore, if these practices are not shown to be unreliable then the beliefs that result from them are rational.

Alston claims that CMP is one of these practices. Christians have been forming beliefs in this way for centuries, and the practice is deeply embedded in the culture. This means that engaging in the practice is prima facie justified. And as long as there are no adequate reasons for thinking that CMP is unreliable then the beliefs that result from this practice will be justified.

Alston goes on to argue that many of the reasons for thinking that CMP is unreliable exhibit one or both of two flaws: imperialism and double standards. Objections such as that CMP must be unreliable because most normal adults do not practice it is, Alston argues, guilty of imperialism. It imposes a standard on CMP that requires it to be more like the Sense-perceptual Practice (SP) for no good epistemic reason. Why should we expect practices that are used by all the population to be the only ones that are reliable? An example of an objection that imposes a double standard would be requiring that the outputs of CMP be independently verifiable. Alston argues that no basic belief forming practice meets this requirement including SP, so requiring something like this of CMP is to apply a standard that one would not apply across the board.

b. The Parity Argument

The beginnings of the parity argument can be seen in Plantinga’s early writings as far back as God and Other Minds. There, Plantinga argues that belief in other minds and belief in God are in the same epistemological dilemma; all of the arguments in their favor fall short when it comes to philosophical scrutiny. Yet, as Plantinga states, “if belief in other minds is rational, so is my belief in God. But obviously the former is rational; so, therefore, is the latter.” As Plantinga’s thinking has developed, so has his parity argument as it relates to rational belief in God. The key difference in his thinking, as he notes in Warranted Christian Belief, is that he no longer takes proofs as the only way to justify belief in God. This major shift in Plantinga’s thinking opens the door for a more daring parity argument, namely that in the same way that perceptual experiences are justified, belief in God—through the divine sense—is also justified and should thus enjoy the same epistemic status as ordinary perceptual experiences.

Plantinga’s parity argument for rational belief in God follows a specific pattern. The first goal is to highlight those beliefs that we take to be both rational and basic. In other words, it needs to be the kind of belief that is rational despite not being inferred from any evidence or argument. Further, it must be the sort of belief that if held hostage to evidential demands it would have devastating epistemological results; perceptual beliefs, it is thought, are specifically what Plantinga is looking for. Consider for example the belief that I see a clock hanging on the wall. It would be difficult to present any non-circular or non-question begging evidence to justify my belief. Yet, this is what the evidentialist demands. So if we can disregard the demands of the evidentialist in the case of perceptual beliefs, then perhaps the demands the evidentialist places on belief in God should be reconsidered as well; neither can produce the required (non-question begging) evidence, but surely in the case of our perceptual beliefs it can’t be said that we as agents are unjustified, epistemically irresponsible, or irrational in our belief. This of course raises further questions about evidential demands. This, then, is the first parallel that Plantinga and other reformed epistemologists make. The second parallel deals with the similarities between perceptual and religious experiences.

Perceptual beliefs arise from some perceptual experience; the belief arises suddenly with the cognizer having no control over the initial belief. The perceptual belief that arises from the experience is prima facie justified. Thomas Reid, whose influence on reformed epistemology is of note, argued that what we perceive is not “only irresistible, but it is immediate; that is, it is not by train of reasoning and argumentation that we come to be convinced of the existence of what we perceive.” Perceptual beliefs, according to Reid, are not inferred but immediately known by the perceiver. The parallels between perceptual beliefs and belief in God, on Plantinga’s account anyway, are important. The idea is that belief in God and perceptual beliefs are both immediate and the result of our cognitive faculties. Thus, if some perceptual belief like “I see a tree” is prima facie justified, then belief in God, if it arises in the same manner (for example, the result of some cognitive faculty), is also prima facie justified.

So what is this special faculty that gives rise to belief in God in an immediate non-inferential fashion? Plantinga uses a term that is well known to most in the reformed tradition called the sensus divinitatis. Calvin, who Plantinga credits with the sensus divinitatis, claimed that one can accept and know that God exists without any argument or evidence. As a result of the workings of the sensus divinitatis, belief in God is properly basic and is not inferred from any evidence or argument. Plantinga’s position is summed up nicely here:

Calvin’s claim, then, is that God has created us in such a way that we have a strong tendency or inclination toward belief in him. This tendency has been in part overlaid or suppressed by sin. Were it not for the existence of sin in the world, human beings would believe in God to the same degree and with the same natural spontaneity that we believe in the existence of other persons, an external world, or the past. This is the natural human condition; it is because of our presently unnatural sinful condition that many find belief in God difficult or absurd. The fact is, Calvin thinks, one who does not believe in God is in an epistemically substandard position—rather like a man who does not believe that his wife exists, or thinks she is likely a cleverly constructed robot and has no thoughts, feelings, or consciousness. Although this belief in God is partially suppressed, it is nonetheless universally present. (Plantinga 1983: 66)

From this, Plantinga concludes that “there is a kind of faculty or cognitive mechanism, what Calvin calls sensus divinitatis or a sense of divinity, which in a wide variety of circumstances produces in us beliefs about God.” So in the same way that perceptual beliefs such as “I see a table” are non-inferential and properly basic, belief in God, when occasioned by the appropriate circumstances (such as one feeling a sense of guilt, dependence, beauty, and so forth), can also be properly basic because of the cognitive working of the sensus divinitatis.

On Plantinga’s reformed account then, belief in God can now be added to the list of properly basic beliefs:

I see a tree (known perceptually),
I am in pain (known introspectively),
I had breakfast this morning (known through memory), and
God exists (known through the sensus divinitatis).

This belief can be taken as properly basic if the agent’s belief has sufficient warrant.

There is another important question to be asked, however. Does it follow from this that belief in God is groundless? If I come to believe in God on the reformed model, can it be said that my belief is groundless? Plantinga argues that in the same way that “I see a tree” is properly basic but not groundless, belief in God is not groundless. Understanding what Plantinga means by “groundless” is important in realizing the distinction between evidence and grounds for belief. Perceptual experiences, such as those caused by visual experiences, are not considered to be groundless because of their reliance on the senses. Likewise, Plantinga claims that belief in God is not groundless, because it is rooted in the experience of the sensus divinitatis. These experiences, however, do not entail that the belief in question is inferential. The belief is merely occasioned by the circumstance (for example, the circumstance of beholding some majestic mountains or desert sunset) which triggers the working of the sensus divinitatis. Those who believe in God simply find themselves with this belief.

Another important point concerns defeaters against belief in God. Plantinga argues that while belief in God is properly basic, it is also open to defeat. Suppose that someone offers a defeater for the belief that God exists; then, claims Plantinga, that particular belief would have to be abandoned. It is possible however, for one to offer a defeater-defeater, which would obviously entail the belief being justifiably maintained. This is an important point in that we can now see that a properly basic belief, for Plantinga, is not some incorrigible or indubitable belief that one can always believe despite defeating evidence. It is, in other words, properly basic but open to defeat.

c. Warranted Christian Belief

Alvin Plantinga has developed an important account of how religious belief could amount to knowledge. This view is discussed in his trilogy: Warrant: The Current Debate, Warrant and Proper Function, and finally, Warranted Christian Faith. In this Warrant trilogy, Plantinga is interested in the question “What is knowledge?”, and more specifically in what it is that makes the difference between mere true belief and knowledge. He calls this, whatever it is, warrant.

Warrant is just one of a number of epistemic terms that are used in epistemology; others include justification, rationality and evidence. Warrant is of particular importance, however, because if we can answer the question “What is warrant?” then we will have an answer to the question “What is knowledge?”

Plantinga argues that warrant results from the proper functioning of your cognitive faculties:

[A] belief has warrant for me only if (1) it has been produced in me by cognitive faculties that are working properly (functioning as they ought to, subject to no cognitive dysfunction) in a cognitive environment that is appropriate for my kinds of cognitive faculties, (2) the segment of the design plan governing the production of that belief is aimed at the production of true beliefs, and (3) there is a high statistical probability that a belief produced under those conditions will be true. (Plantinga 1993: 46-47)

Key to Plantinga’s analysis of warrant is that a belief can only be warranted if it is produced by a cognitive faculty that is functioning properly, which means that it must not be diseased or broken or hindered. In order to make sense of what it means for our cognitive faculties to be functioning properly we must introduce the notion of a design plan, which determines the way our cognitive faculties are supposed to work. Just as the human heart is supposed to beat at 50-80 beats per minute while at rest, so too, there is a way that our cognitive faculties are supposed to function. This, claims Plantinga, should not be thought to necessarily invoke the notion of conscious design (by God, or anyone else), rather he means to invoke the common idea shared by many theists and non-theists, that parts of our bodies have a function, such as one of the functions of our legs being to allow us to move through our environment.

As well as having cognitive faculties that are functioning properly those faculties must also be operating in the right cognitive environment—the one for which they are designed. This means that one might have warrant for a perceptual belief that is formed about a nearby medium sized object on a clear day, but not for a perceptual belief about a far-away object in a badly lit, smoke-filled room. It must also be that the part of the design plan governing the production of the belief in question must be aimed at truth. Our faculties are designed for a number of different purposes, not just the production of true beliefs, which means that it may be that there are times when our cognitive faculties are functioning properly in the correct environment, and yet produce a false belief, or a belief that is only accidentally true. For example, it may be the case that when a person discovers that they have a life-threatening illness that they are designed in such a way that they will come to believe that they will recover, even if this unlikely to be true—this may perhaps be the case because one is more likely to recover if one believes that this is true. That would be a case of cognitive faculties functioning properly in the correct environment, but not a case of the belief being warranted because the design plan, in this instance, does not aim at truth.

The final requirement is that there is a high statistical probability that a belief that is produced by the cognitive faculty in question is likely to be true when it is functioning properly in the environment for which it was designed—which is to say that the design must be a good one. Plantinga imagines a situation in which our faculties have been designed by some lesser deity, and that this deity has done such a poor job, that even when our faculties are functioning properly, in the correct environment, according to a design plan that is aimed at truth, we still form mostly false beliefs because the design is so poor. If this was the case then our beliefs would not have warrant, even in cases where they did turn out to be true. For this reason a reliability condition is required as well.

One important point to note is that Plantinga’s account is an externalist one. This means that, on Plantinga’s view, warrant involves, not just facts that the agent is aware of, but also facts that the agent may not be aware of; such as, for example, whether one’s faculties are functioning properly and facts about the environment. This point is crucial to Plantinga’s account given that whether or not a theist has warrant for her religious beliefs may depend on facts that she is unaware of.

Plantinga claims that given this view in epistemology there is no good reason to think that religious belief is not warranted. Plantinga claims that, following John Calvin, we may have been created by God with a faculty called the sensus divinitatis. Any beliefs that result from this faculty will be in a position to be warranted. So long as the faculty was designed by God for the purpose of producing true beliefs about him then this faculty will meet the requirements described above and the resulting beliefs will be warranted.

It is not Plantinga’s intention to show that this faculty exists or that this really is the way that religious beliefs come about. Instead his claim is that since this is true for all we know then one cannot reasonably claim that religious beliefs are not rational without first showing that this account is false.

7. Objections to Reformed Epistemology

Reformed epistemology has received a significant amount of attention and attracted many objections. Some of the most significant ones are described below.

a. Great Pumpkin Objection

There is a family of objections known as Great Pumpkin objections. These objections get their name from the Peanuts comic strip. In peanuts the character Linus is a child who believes that each Halloween the Great Pumpkin will come to visit him at the pumpkin patch. What these objections have in common is that they claim that, if reformed epistemology is correct, then belief in God is no more rational than belief in the Great Pumpkin.

This kind of objection is first mentioned by Plantinga in “Reason and Belief in God” (74-78). One of the claims of reformed epistemology is that the religious believer need not offer any criteria for deciding which beliefs are reasonable starting points for forming further beliefs. Instead each community is responsible for determining its own starting points and reasoning on that basis. Plantinga supposes that someone might object to this by claiming that this method means that the community in question will have no reason to accept any belief over any other. This community could take belief in God to be properly basic, but they might instead take the belief that the earth is flat or that I can run at the speed of light if I try really hard, or the belief that the Great Pumpkin will return at Halloween to the most deserving pumpkin patches. There is no reason, so the objection goes, to choose one belief over another without first offering some criteria for determining which beliefs are rational starting points and which are not.

Plantinga points out that in other areas we are able to discriminate between two things even if we are not able to give criteria for how that discrimination is to be done. The example he gives is the meaningfulness of sentences. Plantinga observes that we can easily tell that the sentence “T’was brillig; and the slithy toves did gyre and gymble in the wabe” is meaningless even if we cannot appeal to some general criteria of meaning. Likewise, claims Plantinga, there is no reason to think that something similar will not be possible for beliefs. This example shows that there is nothing mysterious about the suggestion that we might be able to tell which candidates belong to a certain class, and which do not, without also being able to state criteria for inclusion. For these reasons this objection need not trouble the reformed epistemologist.

Michael Martin offers a more troubling version of the argument. He does not label his objection as a Great Pumpkin objection, but Plantinga refers to it as the Son of the Great Pumpkin objection. Here is how Martin phrases the objection:

Although reformed epistemologists would not have to accept voodoo beliefs as rational, voodoo followers would be able to claim that insofar as they are basic in the voodoo community they are rational and, moreover, that reformed thought was irrational in this community. Indeed, Plantinga’s proposal would generate many different communities that could legitimately claim that their basic beliefs are rational. (Martin 1990: 272)

This second objection concerns whether or not a community can make judgments about the basic beliefs of other communities in a principled way. They may be able to argue that the believers in some other community are not justified in holding some of their non-basic beliefs, because they are not adequately supported by their basic beliefs, but since the basic beliefs are not supported by other beliefs, there seems to be no way for those outside the community to criticize them. If this is correct, it is a very strange and counter-intuitive result. There are various beliefs that we think are objectionable, even if they are held in the basic way; for example, belief that the Great Pumpkin will return every Halloween, that the Earth is flat and the claims of astrology all seem to be objectionable from the epistemic point of view, whether or not they are held in the basic way.

The reformed epistemologist regards the process of assembling examples of properly basic beliefs to be the responsibility of each community, and so, it would seem, at least at first, that she is committed to a sort of epistemic relativism whereby the most one can do to criticize the beliefs of a person from a different community is to point out internal inconsistencies. This wouldn’t necessarily be a major problem, except for the fact that the sorts of communities that seem to be included are ones that hold bizarre, irrational or superstitious beliefs—beliefs like astrology, voodoo or perhaps even the Great Pumpkin belief.

The reformed epistemologist can respond to this objection by pointing out that one could challenge the basic beliefs of another community by finding a defeater. Our basic beliefs are defeasible, and therefore open to revision in light of further information. This means that just because you are permitted to treat a belief as properly basic if it seems to you that it is, it does not follow that you will continue to be permitted to hold that belief no matter what. You may gain a defeater for that belief and come to believe that it is no longer true. A person may be justified in taking a belief such as the Great Pumpkin belief as basic if she has been raised to believe that the Great Pumpkin exists, but when she comes to learn more about the world—for example, when, yet again, the Great Pumpkin fails to arrive on Halloween—she will obtain a defeater for that belief, and it will no longer be reasonable for her to hold that belief.

The reformed epistemologist is therefore not endorsing an epistemic free-for-all, since just because a belief is basic does not mean that it is immune to epistemic appraisal. It is still perfectly possible for anyone to argue against the basic beliefs of another community, and to show them that one of their beliefs is false or unjustified.

The third, and final, version of this objection claims that reformed epistemology places belief in God beyond epistemic appraisal and that its methods could be adapted to place other beliefs beyond epistemic appraisal—beliefs that are clearly irrational like belief in the Great Pumpkin. If the methods of reformed epistemology can be used to defend beliefs like these then it cannot be successful in establishing the rationality of religious belief.

Linda Zagzebski has offered an objection like this one. She claims that reformed epistemology has failed to meet the requirements of what she calls the “Rational Recognition Principle (RRP): If a belief is rational, its rationality is recognizable, in principle, by rational persons in other cultures” (Zagzebski in Plantinga et al. 2002: 120). Zagzebski directs her objection against Plantinga and writes that reformed epistemology

violates the Rational Recognition principle. It does not permit a rational observer outside the community of believers in the model to distinguish between Plantinga’s model and the beliefs of any group, no matter how irrational and bizarre—sun-worshippers, cult followers, devotées of the Greek gods . . . , assuming, of course, that they are clever enough to build their own epistemic doctrines into their models in a parallel fashion. But we do think that there are differences in the rationality of the beliefs of a cult and Christian beliefs, even if the cult is able to produce an exactly parallel argument for a conditional proposition to the effect that the beliefs of the cult are rational if true. Hence, the rationality of such beliefs must depend upon something other than their truth. (Zagzebski in Plantinga et al. 2002: 122)

A similar objection is offered by Keith DeRose in his unpublished essay “Voodoo Epistemology.” DeRose argues that the real worry for reformed epistemology is that it could be adapted to defend some very strange and clearly irrational beliefs. This, claims DeRose, shows that there is something wrong with reformed epistemology even if we cannot say exactly what it is.

This objection is not completely devastating for reformed epistemology but it does make the achievements of reformed epistemology look much less significant. Work in this area by Kyle Scott (2014) has suggested that we ought to consider the historical and social environments that beliefs occur in, arguing that only beliefs that occur in stable and enduring communities are viable candidates for being defended in the way that reformed epistemologists defend religious belief.

b. Disanalogies

An important claim made by reformed epistemology is that religious belief can be rationally held in the basic way, similar to perceptual beliefs. An objection to this is that it cannot be reasonable to hold religious beliefs in the basic way because of significant differences between perceptual beliefs and religious beliefs. The objection has been most forcefully put by Richard Grigg (1983). He does not think that theistic beliefs will turn out to be basic because of the disanalogies between theistic beliefs and more widely recognized basic beliefs.

Grigg interprets reformed epistemology as arguing that the Christian community is within its epistemic rights in holding that certain theistic beliefs are basic because these beliefs are analogous to other beliefs that are more widely regarded to be basic. Examples of these include: (1) I see a tree, (2) I had breakfast this morning, and (3) That person is angry. Grigg identifies three important disanalogies between these beliefs and theistic beliefs.

Firstly, Grigg points out that although beliefs such as (1)-(3) will often be basic, they are still constantly being confirmed:

For example, when I return home this evening, I will see some dirty dishes sitting in my sink, one less egg in my refrigerator than was there yesterday, etc. This is not to say that (2) is believed because of evidence. Rather, it is a basic belief grounded immediately by memory. But one of the reasons that I take such memory beliefs as properly basic is that my memory is almost always subsequently confirmed by empirical evidence. (Grigg 1983: 126)

This, on the other hand, is not true of theistic belief. Beliefs, such as that God created the world, Grigg suggests, are not confirmed by observation, and may even be disconfirmed if the problem of evil is a successful argument.

The second disanalogy is that there is a certain universality enjoyed by beliefs such as (1)-(3), but not by theistic beliefs. That is, when a person has a perceptual experience such as being appeared to treely, they will naturally believe something like “I see a tree”; and this is the case, claims Grigg, for the vast majority of people. The situation is not the same for theistic beliefs; take, for example, Plantinga’s suggestion that one might have an experience of being awed by the beauty of the universe and form the belief that God created the universe. Grigg claims that many people have this experience yet there is no universally shared belief that typically comes with this experience, unlike in the case of perceptual beliefs.

The third, and final, disanalogy that Grigg raises is that people have a bias towards theistic beliefs, but not usually with less controversial examples of properly basic beliefs. Grigg points out that there is a psychological benefit to be gained from believing that God exists, whereas, there will not usually be any obvious benefit for beliefs like (1)-(3).

Each of these disanalogies can be challenged. Mark Macleod points out that it is not obvious that these are genuine disanalogies. For example, religious beliefs may receive confirmation from multiple sources such as sacred writings, the testimony of other believers and further religious experiences. Although these sources are not independent of each other it is not clear that the experiences in the breakfast example above are independent either since all the supporting evidence relies on perceptual experience at some point.

The second disanalogy is problematic as well because when a person has an experience of seeing a tree they may form a wide variety of belief such as “I see a tree” or “that tree is about to fall over” or “it is very windy today”. Contrary to what Grigg argues the beliefs that are formed in response to perceptual experiences are not uniform.

The third disanology is also not clearly a genuine disanology. I may derive psychological benefit from many of my perceptual beliefs such as believing that the computer screen is showing a positive number next to my bank account.

Even if the case for disanalogies between perceptual experiences and religious experience can be proved, then, this may not be a problem for reformed epistemology. Reformed epistemology should not be understood as relying on the claim that religious experience is just like perceptual experience. Rather what reformed epistemologists have been arguing for is that we ought to judge religious experience by the same standards as we judge perceptual experiences, and that religious experience stands up well when judged by those standards. Given the difference in subject matter and the alleged faculties involved, then, it should not be surprising to find disanalogies between religious experience and perceptual experience. To develop any disanalogies into an objection to reformed epistemology it must also be shown that the disanalogies are sufficient to show that such beliefs are not rational unless supported by further evidence.

c. Religious Diversity

According to reformed epistemology religious belief can be rational even if it is not supported by evidence. What reformed epistemologists do not claim is that these beliefs will be immune to defeat. It may be that a person’s religious beliefs are initially irrational, but when they discover some new piece of information they cease to be. Some have suggested that, even if reformed epistemology is correct, there is a defeater for religious belief that ought to be apparent to most competent adults in the world today. This defeater comes from considering the facts of religious diversity. In this section we will consider two attempts to advance this sort of objection.

i. Religious Belief is Epistemically Arbitrary

Suppose, for the sake of argument at least, that all of the major religions might be equally well supported by arguments and that its adherents might all have the same sort of internally available markers for their beliefs. The scenario would be one where whatever the theist can offer in support of her beliefs, those who disagree can offer the same considerations. For example, suppose that Anne believes p and Bill believes ¬p, and that whatever evidence or arguments Anne can offer in support of p Bill can offer equally good evidence and arguments in support of ¬p. Suppose further that their beliefs are alike in all other respects, so that if Anne finds p intuitive, Bill finds ¬p intuitive; or if Anne takes p as foundational Bill takes Øp as foundational; and so on for any other considerations that might be epistemically relevant. John Hick claims that if this is the case then it is intellectually arbitrary for the religious believer to hold that her own beliefs are true while those of other religions are false because she has no reason to treat the beliefs differently.

Richard Feldman also offers a similar objection by arguing for the following principle:

If (i) S has some good reasons (‘internal markers’) to believe P, but (ii) also knows that other people have equally good reasons (‘internal markers’) for believing things incompatible with P, and (iii) S has no reason to discount their reasons and favor her own, then S is not justified in believing P. (Feldman 2003: 88)

This principle states that even if you have good reasons for believing p, if you know that others have equally good reasons for believing something incompatible with p, and you have no reason to discount their reason then you are not justified in accepting p. This is because, claims Feldman, learning that others have equally good reasons for their incompatible beliefs undercuts your justification for p.

Alvin Plantinga has responded to this objection by trying to show that there is nothing inconsistent about holding onto your beliefs in the face of disagreement—even in the circumstances described above.

His first point is that the internal support that a belief enjoys does not exhaust everything that can be said about the epistemic status of a belief. Two beliefs can have all the same “internal markers” and yet still not be equal from the epistemic point of view. Other relevant features include whether or not the faculty that produced the belief is functioning properly, and whether or not the belief was produced in an environment for which the faculty was designed. Furthermore, one does not need to endorse Plantinga’s epistemology in order to agree with this point. Others have suggested that external factors are relevant to the epistemic standing of a belief; such as reliability of the source of the belief, whether the belief is safe or whether the belief is sensitive. What this means is that there is no inconsistency in thinking that two incompatible beliefs are alike in purely internal support and yet for us to treat them differently. This is a very modest claim and supplies no reason to think that judging two such beliefs differently in the sorts of cases described can be justified, only that it is not contradictory to do so. This point is supposed to lay the basis for his following two points.

The second point is that if disagreement is a defeater then it would defeat too many beliefs. Plantinga labels it a “philosophical tar baby,” claiming that it would be a problem not just for him, but for his objectors as well. This is because whatever position one adopts in this debate there will be others who disagree. The Christian will believe certain claims knowing that others in similar epistemic situations disagree, as will the Hindu or the Muslim. An atheist or a pluralist will be in no better a situation since she will think that the claims of these religions are false, and know that there others who disagree. Plantinga does not think that withholding belief avoids the problem either since if one withholds belief there will still be disagreement concerning whether or not withholding belief is the correct epistemic attitude to adopt. This worry also extends to other areas as well, such as politics and philosophy where there is also widespread disagreement. What this is supposed to show is that claiming that disagreement is a defeater has potentially disastrous consequences leading to a sort of skepticism. This, of course, does not show that it is wrong that disagreement defeats belief, it is only meant to show that this problem is a problem for everyone, and it is not one that is solely a problem for the religious believer.

Plantinga’s third point is offered by way of a thought experiment:

Perhaps you have always believed it deeply wrong for a counselor to use his position of trust to seduce a client. Perhaps you discover that others disagree; they think it more like a minor peccadillo, like running a red light when there’s no traffic; and you realize that possibly these people have the same internal markers for their beliefs that you have for yours. You think the matter over more fully, imaginatively recreate and rehearse such situations, become more aware of just what is involved in such a situation (the breach of trust, the breaking of implied promises, the injustice and unfairness, the nasty irony of the situation in which someone comes to a counsellor seeking help but receives only hurt) and come to believe even more firmly the belief that such an action is wrong… (Plantinga 2012: 653)

Plantinga claims that in moral cases, such as this one, it is clear that it is reasonable to continue believing in the face of disagreement even when you believe that those who disagree enjoy the same internal markers as yourself. If it is reasonable in this case to continue to hold on to your beliefs then it cannot be true in general that one is required to give up beliefs in the face of disagreement.

Plantinga thinks that these three considerations are sufficient to diffuse the charge of arbitrariness. His claim is that if we endorse something like Feldman’s principle above then we will be forced to give up many of our beliefs (possibly including beliefs about the principle itself) and in particular this does not fit with our intuitions about what it is rational to do in the case of moral disagreements like the one Plantinga describes above.

These responses do something to help neutralize the arbitrariness charge but they do not adequately deal with it. What Plantinga has achieved is to show that we cannot always be rationally required to give up our beliefs in the face of disagreement. But that is not sufficient to respond to the problem because there are examples where it does seem to arbitrary to hold on to your belief. An example often discussed in the literature is the restaurant case.

Suppose that Anne and Bill are in a restaurant with friends. The time comes to pay the bill and they both decide to figure out how much everyone owes. Anne believes that everyone owes $23, but Bill believes everyone owes $24. Each considers the other to be just as good at mental arithmetic and they have no reason to suspect that one of them is impaired on this occasion. In this example it seems clear that it would be irrational for Anne to hold on to her belief that everyone owes $23 even if it turns out that she is correct. She seems to have no good reason to prefer her own belief other than that it is her own.

What this suggests is that it cannot be either that disagreement always requires us to revise our beliefs or that it never requires us to revise our beliefs. What is needed is a more sophisticated epistemology of disagreement that lies somewhere between these two extremes. But Plantinga has given us no reason to think that religious beliefs will remain rational in the face of disagreement under this more reasonable epistemology of disagreement. What is needed here is a better understanding of the epistemic implications of disagreement and how that relates to religious disagreement. Fortunately, there is an active debate on this topic and it is likely that one’s opinion on that debate will determine whether or not one believes that this is a successful objection.

ii. Competing Belief Forming Practices

One of the central claims of reformed epistemology is that what determines whether religious belief is rational is not the evidence that a believer can present, but facts about the faculty that produced the belief. The facts of religious diversity offer a way to mount an argument that concludes that we have good reason to think that the faculty that produces religious belief is unreliable.

Before looking at a serious version of this argument it will be instructive to look at a naïve version of the argument and why it fails. This version of the argument observes the wide variety of religious beliefs in the world and notes that many of them contradict each other. Given this disagreement it seems clear that religious belief forming methods are unreliable because, even if some of the beliefs are correct, most of them must be false. Given the wide diversity of religious beliefs, most of these beliefs must be false. This objection is not too troubling since it assumes that there is a single religious belief forming practice. That is, however, implausible. There are significant differences in the practices of different religious practitioners, so the diversity of belief is not evidence that all religious belief forming practices are unreliable.

This objection can be developed further by observing that when it comes to religious matters there are competing methods. These competing methods frequently produce contradictory beliefs. At most, one of these methods can be reliable, but if we have no independent (that is, independent of religious belief forming methods) reason to prefer one over the others then we ought to refrain from engaging in any of them.

William Alston raises this objection against his own view. He compares it to the following situation:

Consider ways of predicting the weather: various ‘scientific’ meteorological approaches, going by the state of rheumatism in one’s joints, and observing groundhogs. Again, if one employs one of these methods but has no non-question-begging reason for supposing that method to be more reliable than the others, then one has no sufficient rational basis for reposing confidence in its outputs. (Alston 1991: 271)

It seems clear, when it comes to choosing between methods for predicting the weather, that if we have several competing methods we ought not accept any of them until we find some reason to prefer one over the other.

Alston responds to this objection by pointing out that there is an important difference between the religious case and the weather prediction case. When it comes to predicting the weather we know what sort of evidence we would need to choose between these methods—we can observe which one is getting it right. Things are different for the religious case because we do not know what reasons we could have for choosing one of these methods over another. The methods in question in the religious case are our only access to the topic—independently of these methods it is difficult to see what reasons we could have for preferring one over another. In light of this, Alston suggests that one cannot be faulted for lacking reasons to prefer one’s own religious belief forming methods.

d. Sensible Evidentialism

One of the central claims of reformed epistemology is that evidentialism with respect to belief in God is misguided. Stephen Wykstra argues that reformed epistemologists (or basicalists, as he calls them) have poorly framed the debate between themselves and evidentialists. He has sought to relocate the debate about the proper basicality of belief in God by contrasting reformed epistemology not with what he calls Extravagant Evidentialism (EE) but with Sensible Evidentialism (SE).

EE is the claim that a person’s belief is only rational if it is either basic, or that person can present propositional evidence for their belief. If we use this to define basic and non-basic beliefs then beliefs that arise from testimony or memory will often be basic. Since these beliefs are basic and belief in God often derives from memory or testimony, then in most cases the EE Objection to belief in God will not amount to much.

Wykstra, however, claims that EE is not the best way to understand the notion of needing evidence. He highlights this by using the example of belief in electrons. Most adults believe in electrons, but very few hold this belief on the basis of evidence. Most of us believe in electrons because we have been told that they exist by scientists, or teachers or some other knowledgeable person. According to the reformed epistemologist this belief will often be basic, and so it will be immune to the evidentialist objection. This is only true if we understand evidentialism as a demand that evidence be produced for each belief by the believer. This fails to take into account that, although the believer in electrons need not be able to produce evidence, the belief is still in some sense in need of evidence. Wykstra asks us to consider the following possible situation:

Suppose we were to discover that no evidential case is available for electrons—say, that the entire presumed case for electrons was a fraud propagated by clever con-men in Copenhagen in the 1920s. Would we, in this event, shrug our shoulders and continue unvexedly believing in electrons? Hardly. We would instead regard our electron belief as being in jeopardy, in epistemic hot water, in (let us put it) big doxastic trouble. (Wykstra 1989: 485)

The electron belief may not need evidence to be rational in an individualistic sense, but evidence must be available somewhere in the community. The testimony is defective if it does not connect you to a person, or persons, who do have evidence for the existence of electrons. This is what Wykstra refers to as a much more sensible way of construing the notion of needing evidence. EE requires that evidence is possessed by the individual, whereas SE requires that the evidence is possessed by the believer’s community.

SE gives us a much more plausible evidentialist objection to belief in God. The sensible evidentialist constraint will be that belief in God is only epistemically adequate if the religious community has sufficient evidence for the belief that God exists. The “interesting basicalist” will then be someone who claims that belief in God is not in need of evidence even in this sense; that belief in God is based upon our native faculties. Wykstra observes that even if belief in God is derived from some God-given faculty it may still be the case that belief in God is in need of evidence. Belief in electrons is in need of evidence because our native faculties do not give us access to them, but beliefs based upon our native faculties, such as testimony, are also sometimes in need of evidence in a rather different way. Wykstra draws attention to some of the insights of Thomas Reid concerning testimony:

When brought to maturity by proper culture … [reason] learns to suspect testimony in some case, and to disbelieve it in others … But still, to the end of life, she finds a necessity of borrowing light from testimony … And as, in many instances, Reason even in her maturity, borrows aid from testimony, so in others she mutually gives aid to it, and strengthens its authority. For, as we find good reason to reject testimony in some cases, so in others we find good reason to rely upon it with perfect security… (Wykstra 1989: 489)

According to Reid, we each have a natural tendency to believe testimony, however, over time we learn that not all testimony is reliable and we learn to find reasons to give some testimony greater weight and others much less. Although inferences are playing a role in forming testimonial belief, it is still testimony that gives support to the belief; inference only plays a refining role.

In light of varied religious beliefs and experiences, both across and within particular religious traditions, we must conclude that evidence is needed to discriminate between different religious beliefs. This does not mean that religious experience cannot ground belief in God. It may be that some religious faculty grounds the belief, but that the faculty is in need of refinement, just like testimony can be a basic source of knowledge, but still in need of refinement. This continues to draw on the teachings of the Christian tradition because although some Christians hold that we have access to God through our native faculties, they have been marred by sin, so it should not be surprising that we can err in our knowledge of God, or that our native faculties alone are not sufficient.

This sensible evidentialist objection should not really be called an objection; perhaps the sensible evidentialist problem would be better. That is because Wykstra is not urging the reader to give up belief in God, but rather to properly acknowledge the role that evidence can and does play in knowing God. This problem seems to have played some role in motivating the later work of Alvin Plantinga where he is attempting to set out a positive account of how religious beliefs could amount to knowledge, rather than simply responding to an objection.

8. References and Further Reading

Alston, William. “Religious Experience and Religious Belief”. In Nous 16 (1982): 3-12.
- An early essay by one of the central proponents of reformed epistemology.
Alston, William. Perceiving God. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1991.
- An important work on the epistemology of religious experience.
Baker, Deane-Peter. Tayloring Reformed Epistemology. London: SCM Press, 2007.
- An attempt to bring together the work of Charles Taylor and certain aspects of reformed epistemology. Includes a helpful description and critique of arguments for reformed epistemology.
Beilby, James. Epistemology as Theology. Burlington, VA: Ashgate Publishing, 2005.
- A detailed account of Alvin Plantinga’s reformed epistemology.
DeRose, Keith. “Voodoo Epistemology” unpublished manuscript.
- A well-known essay – despite being unpublished – that criticizes Alvin Plantinga’s reformed epistemology.
Feldman, Richard. “Plantinga on Exclusivism”. In Faith and Philosophy 20 (2003): 85-90.
- A paper arguing that it cannot be rational to hold religious beliefs when one is aware of the widespread disagreement about religion.
Grigg, Richard. “Theism and Proper Basicality: A response to Plantinga”. In International Journal for Philosophy if Religion 14 (1983): 123-127.
- An essay challenging the reformed epistemologist’s claim that there is a parity between perceptual belief and theistic beliefs.
Kenny, Anthony. Faith and Reason. New York: Columbia University Press, 1983.
- Much of this book is on religious epistemology and it engages with reformed epistemology.
Mackie, J.L. The Miracle of Theism. New York: Oxford University Press, 1982.
- An important book providing many arguments against theism.
Martin, Michael. Atheism: A Philosophical Justification. Philadelphia: Temple University Press, 1990.
- This book presents numerous arguments in favour of atheism and against theism – including against reformed epistemology.
Plantinga, Alvin. God and Other Minds. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1967.
- An early account of Plantinga’s parity argument which lays the foundation for reformed epistemology.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press, 1993.
- A discussion of proper function which also lays the foundation for Plantinga’s Warranted Christian Belief.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
- Arguably the most important work in reformed epistemology to date. Plantinga articulates and defends his version of the view at great length. It engages with many important debates in Philosophy of Religion.
Plantinga, Alvin. “A Defense of Religious Exclusivism” in Louis Pojman and Michael Rae (eds) Philosophy of Religion: An Anthology. Boston: Wadsworth, 2012.
- Plantinga argues that it can be reasonable to believe that your religion is correct and that others are wrong.
Plantinga, Alvin and Nicholas Wolterstorff. Faith and Rationality. Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press, 1983.
- Contains many important early essays articulating and defending reformed epistemology.
Plantinga, A., Sudduth, M., Wykstra, S. and Zagzebski, L. “Warranted Christian Belief”. In Philosophical Books 43 (2002): 81-135.
- A collection of essays critically engaging with Warranted Christian Belief, along with a reply from Alvin Plantinga.
Scott, Kyle. “Return of the Great Pumpkin”. In Religious Studies 50 (2014): 297-308.
- A recent formulation of an objection to reformed epistemology along with a new response.
Sudduth, Michael. The Reformed Objection to Natural Theology. London: Ashgate, 2009.
- Deals with the objections to natural theology that are typically posed by the reformed epistemologist.
Tomberlin, James and Peter van Inwagen (eds.). Alvin Plantinga. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1985.
- A collection of essays examining the work of Alvin Plantinga, one of the central figures in reformed epistemology.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Reason within the Bounds of Religion. Grand Rapids, MI: Eerdmans, 1976.
- An exploration of how his Christian faith ought to relate to his work as a scholar.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Lament for a Son. Grand Rapids, MI: Eerdmans, 1987.
- Though not an academic book, some important points are made about reformed epistemology and religious epistemology in general.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Divine Discourse. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- A Philosophical exploration of claims that God speaks.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Justice: Rights and Wrongs. Princeton University Press, 2010.
- Offers an account of rights and of justice. Engages significantly with Christian thought.
Wykstra, Stephen. “Toward a sensible evidentialism: on the notion of ‘needing evidence’.” In Philosophy of Religion, New York: Harcourt Brace Jovanovich (1989): 426-437.
- An analysis of Plantinga’s critique of evidentialism.
Zagzebski, Linda (ed.). Rational Faith: Catholic Responses to Reformed Epistemology, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1993.
- A response to reformed epistemology from various Catholic philosophers.

Author Information

Anthony Bolos
Email: ABolos@vcu.edu
Virginia Commonwealth University
U. S. A.

and

Kyle Scott
Email: k.scott@heythrop.ac.uk
Heythrop College
United Kingdom

Feminist Ethics and Narrative Ethics

A narrative approach to ethics focuses on how stories that are told, written, or otherwise expressed by individuals and groups help to define and structure our moral universe. Specifically, narrative ethicists take the practices of storytelling, listening, and bearing empathetic, careful witness to these stories to be central to understanding and evaluating not just the unique circumstances of particular lives, but the wider moral contexts within which we all exist. In telling stories, they suggest, we both create and reveal who we think we are as moral agents and as persons; in granting these stories uptake—that is, in giving them epistemic credibility—we help to mold and sustain the moral identities of others, as well as our own. Thus, theorists engaged in narratively-based moral scholarship take stories to be foundational for how we view the world and our place in it, arguing that they are the means through which we can make ourselves morally intelligible to ourselves and to others. At their best, narrative methodologies offer non-ideal, epistemically rich approaches—that are not grounded in strict, juridical principles—to a number of philosophical discourses, including those central to questions of morality, identity, and social justice. At their most worrisome, they appear to be merely loosely-related notions about the constitutive roles of stories in moral theory and practice that do not easily lend themselves to rigorous moral justifications, epistemic explanations, or the guiding of action, raising concerns about the theoretical and practical soundness of the whole endeavor.

Introduction
Feminist Ethics
Narrative Theories and Methodologies
Feminist Ethics and Narrative
Some Criticisms of Narrative Approaches to Ethics
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Even as a relatively new set of moral discourses and practices, narrative ethics has made its presence known. Among the areas within philosophy in which the influence of narrative has been particularly influential are biomedical ethics and feminist ethics. While this entry will only minimally touch on the former, the focus on the latter requires some qualification: While the themes, concerns, and ideas that connect feminist ethics and narrative theory are philosophically significant, this is not to suggest that all (or even most) of feminist ethics employs narrative methodologies, or that all (or most) feminist ethicists are narrativists. In fact, in addressing the oppression of women and other disadvantaged individuals and groups, a number are focused on alternative, non-narrative methodologies (for example, multicultural feminists tend to focus on interconnected systems of oppression, which may or may not be grounded in oppressive narratives) while others (for example, certain liberal feminists who tend to focus on justice-related remedies) reject the personal turn altogether. Thus, the connection between narrative ethics and feminist ethics as explored here ought not be viewed as global or as necessary, but as one that exists whenever the focus on the particular, on stories, and on phenomenologies within feminist ethics intersects with the conception of narratives as normatively constituting our moral universe. Viewed in this light, their relationship is philosophically important in the sense of sharing an anti-totalizing, anti-hierarchical views of the practices of morality, as well as in the sense of emphasizing the necessity of greater inclusivity in moral discourses. Indeed, to view feminist ethics through the lens of narrative, or to conceive of narrative ethics as an approach to feminist value theory is not to exhaust the claims, significance, or methodologies of either one—it is simply to examine overlapping aspects of both, and how they have, and continue, to shape each other. This entry, then, will focus will be on the complicated relationship between feminist ethics and narrative ethics. And while narrative ethics does not always neatly intersect with some of the concerns of feminist theorists, the relationship between feminist ethics and narrative ethics is nevertheless a rather dynamic one, combining the social, political, epistemic, and other insights of feminist theory with the fluid methodologies of narrative. Moreover, although a number of feminist theorists have benefitted from, and contributed to, the various insights provided by narrative approaches to ethics, no single method or theory can definitively be called “narrative feminist ethics.”

Thus, this entry will not endeavor to reduce the relationship between feminist ethics and narrative ethics to a single approach, but instead, will address the ongoing discourses between narrative approaches to ethics and feminist ethics, focusing on four specific issues: (1). What are some of the central concerns of feminist ethicists? (2) What are narrative methodologies, and how do they pertain to ethics, and specifically, to feminist ethics? (3) How have the theorists engaged in feminist ethics turned to narrative, and which aspects of narrative seem to be most useful to their projects? (4) What are some general criticisms of narrative as an approach to ethics, broadly construed?

2. Feminist Ethics

Although the main purpose of this entry is not an exploration of the many nuances of the approaches to feminist ethics or the work of feminist ethicists, it is important to note how feminist ethics differs from the more “traditional” ethical theories, and importantly, how this difference makes feminist ethics responsive to narrative approaches and methodologies. To a large extent, feminist ethical theory can be understood as both a response to, and a movement against, a historical tradition of more abstract, universalist, ethical theories such as utilitarianism, deontology, and in certain respects, contractarianism and virtue theory, which tend to view the moral agent either as an autonomous, rational actor, deliberating out of a calculus of utility or duty, or else as an often disembodied and decontextualized ideal decision-maker, unburdened by the non-ideal constraints of luck (moral and otherwise), circumstance, or capability (Nagel 1979; Brennan 1999; Nussbaum 2000). Specifically, feminist ethicists contend that this top-down, juridical, principlist theorizing has largely neglected the centrality of physical, social, and psychological situatedness, power differentials, and, importantly, the voices of women whose lived experiences have simply not been part of any ongoing moral debates (Young 2005; Jaggar 1992; Walker 1997; Lindemann Nelson 2001; Held 1990; Tessman 2005). As Alison Jaggar argues, traditional ethics emphasize male-centered issues of the public and the abstract while dismissing the private and the situated. As a result, women, and “women’s issues” that have to do with care, interdependent relationships, community, partiality, and the emotions, are de-centered, and relegated to the margins of serious intellectual (and specifically philosophical) inquiry (Tong and Williams 2014; Jaggar 1992). While there is a significant number of subgroups of feminists—traditionally, including care ethicists, Marxist feminist, liberal feminists, radical feminists, and ecofeminists, and lately, divided into a greater variety of feminisms, including analytic feminism, continental feminism, radical lesbian separatist feminism, pragmatist feminism, psychoanalytic feminism, and all the intersections among them—the intent of feminist theory has been, and remains, the elimination of group and individual oppressions, and especially the silencing oppression of women, both in philosophical discourse and in the wider world (Tuana 2011). As Brennan argued, “feminist ethical theories [are] those ethical theories which share two central aims: (a) to achieve a theoretical understanding of women’s oppression with the purpose of providing a route to ending women’s oppression and (b) to develop an account of morality which is based on women’s moral experience(s)” (Brennan 860, 1999, citing Jaggar 1991).

While this entry does not address the many varieties or the latest developments within feminist ethics, it is important to note its general, and persistent, commitment to for the rejection of, among other things, the sort of universalizable, uniform, acontextual “view from nowhere” that characterized much of ethical theory. As noted earlier, feminist ethics has generally pointed to the lack of serious philosophical attention to the aspects of human life where women (and other minorities) tend to predominate, thus leading to a deficit of inclusion of these actors who were subsequently made invisible to anthropocentric theory. In taking seriously, and including, the contexts, relationships, and commitments of women’s (and many marginal others’) experiences in its theorizing, feminist ethics does not deprive these individuals and groups of their moral agency. In this way, feminist ethics opens up the spaces of reasons within moral theory to marginalized others by, on the one hand, affirming the necessity of socially inclusive moral work, and on the other, by challenging the socially (and otherwise) excluding practices, boundaries, and limitations of its current discourses. Finally, although not strictly a part of this discussion, it is important to note that liberal feminism, and liberal feminists, like Susan Moller Okin, represent an important exception to the more particularist, subjective approaches to women’s freedom noted earlier, focusing instead on the need for women’s personal and political autonomy, promoted by the liberal state, that enable their flourishing as persons, and fighting for democratic self-determination denied to women by social and political patriarchies (Okin 1989).

What is mostly dismissed or neglected by traditional moral theorists is any engagement with non-ideal actors in non-ideal environments. Often, the default “autonomous moral agent” within moral philosophy is an otherwise unencumbered, abstract decision-maker, understood to be a man, coming to a decision that is not otherwise burdened by the messy contextuality of an actual lived life (Tong and Williams 2014; Jaggar 1992; Brennan 1999). The result was not only a simplification of what it might mean to be a situated agent in non-ideal circumstances, but also the wholesale absence of agents who were not male, not unencumbered, and certainly not abstract. In other words, those left out of the moral calculus—indeed, out of the philosophical moral imaginaries—were women, people of color, LGBTQ communities, economically underprivileged individuals, and many others. Because many of these non-standard agents are engaged with the world in ways not considered by those relying on abstract agent models in their ethical analyses, and because they are instead participants in the interdependent moral practices that define them in terms of their relationships with others, they are viewed by a great majority of traditional moral theorists as somehow beyond the scope of philosophical discourse (Held 1990; Tong 2009). Apart from neglecting the fact of men’s own situatedness and embeddedness in the particular circumstances of their lives, the exclusion of entire categories of individuals not only deprived these populations of a voice in philosophical debate, but also removed their experiences from the scope of possible normative discourse altogether. More specifically, the voices, and thus the moral experiences, of women and minorities were effectively silenced as reliable narrators of not only the moral significance of their experiences, but also of what moral theory and practice ought to take into account as its proper subject matter.

In addition to impoverishing and narrowing the idea of what moral theory is more generally, this kind of silencing has had uniquely burdensome costs for the silenced: As the feminist political theorist Iris Marion Young noted, those whose voices and whose presence have been historically missing from public discourses are severely challenged in receiving any kind of uptake of their view even once they attempt to engage (Young 1997; McAfee 2014). In the process of democratic deliberation, for example, those who are not habituated into participating in the overly formal, abstract, and juridical moral and sociopolitical discourses would be continuously marginalized, and, in the end, dismissed. What Young argued ought to be an alternative way of engaging those on the periphery is a kind of a “communicative democracy,” allowing for a number of different communicative styles (including narrative, rhetoric, and storytelling), perspectives, and voices (McAfee 2014).

Thus, understood very broadly, feminist ethics is a response to this epistemic, moral, and sociopolitical silencing born of exclusion, and to the oppression that it underwrites. As Samantha Brennan notes, “[f]eminist ethics seeks to overcome the limits of narrow, male-centered ethics by constructing moral theories which can make sense of the experiences of women as moral agents…feminist ethics has become associated with an ethics of lived, concrete experiences which takes most seriously women’s experiences of morality” (Brennan 1999, 861). Indeed, feminist ethicists, like Margaret Urban Walker, have argued against the impartial universality of “juridical,” or top-down, ethical methodologies that reduce moral reason to rigid, acontextual deductions, and favor more situated, “expressive-collaborative” approaches to morality that expand, rather than restrict, both the spaces of moral reasons as well as the variety of moral agents (Walker 1997).

What feminist philosophers accomplish, therefore, is the broadening and deepening of what it means to be engaged in moral philosophy by introducing the epistemically and morally rich stories of what it is like to be a non-ideal agent in a non-ideal world. It is this turn toward including, confronting, and challenging the oppressions of women (and other oppressed and often silenced populations), that serves as the beginning of the intersection between narrative and feminist ethics. And because like much of feminist moral theory, narrative approaches to ethics emphasize the contextuality, situatedness, and the shared nature of public and private life as central to moral reasoning, some leading feminist philosophers have offered a number of varying approaches to philosophical ethics that can all nevertheless be called “narrative” in significant ways.

3. Narrative Theories and Methodologies

Generally speaking, there is not a single theory of narrative ethics, nor is there a single correct way to engage in narrative analysis. However, there are a number of views and practices that have a family resemblance, and can be construed as a part of a larger, more amorphous field of narrative ethics. One such view about how narrative is to be understood as a part of moral theory is offered by Kathryn Montgomery Hunter. Hunter argues that “[i]n using the word ‘narrative’ somewhat interchangeably with ‘story’ I mean to designate a more or less coherent written, spoken, or (by extension) enacted account of occurrences, whether historical or fictional” (Hunter 1996, 306).

There are many ways to define, and engage in, a narrative approach to ethics. By a “narrative approach,” I mean a focus on the significance of context, situatedness, and, importantly, the communication of the stories people tell about themselves and others in trying to make themselves, others, and, more broadly, their world, mutually intelligible. Narrative ethicists often criticize what they consider to be a preoccupation with impartiality distance, and universalizability at the expense of personal relationships among more traditional juridical moral theories (Walker 1997; Lindemann Nelson 2001; Rimmon-Kenan 2002). What is missing, they suggest, is not merely the exclusion of so many from juridical moral discourses, but, importantly, the warrant for why moral actors would desire, and be motivated by, something like a good will (or a utilitarian-based outcome, or a rights-based justification) as a part of a meaningful life. Indeed, they argue, given the requirements of juridical moral thought, we are left wondering what there is to admire about such a life, why such a life is worth having, and why disinterested detachment from everything and everything one cares about – that is, detachment from all that makes the moral life not just worthwhile but possible – is the sole path to robust moral agency. Although duties and laws might very well be a part of moral work, the “ought” of morality cannot be grounded primarily in bare, unyielding principles.

In response, narrative approaches to moral theory and practice have been put forth by a number of philosophers (especially those engaged in normative ethics and applied ethics, such as medical ethics), literary scholars, and psychologists, including Alasdair MacIntyre, Charles Taylor, Paul Ricoeur, Paul John Eakin, Hilde Lindemann Nelson, Margaret Urban Walker, Martha Nussbaum, Kathryn Montgomery Hunter, and Jerome Bruner, among others. Indeed, the philosopher Marya Schechtman has argued that narratives are not only essential to understanding what we do, but, indeed, to who we are by suggesting that only those who “weave stories of their lives” are, strictly speaking, persons. This is so, she suggests, because one’s narrative is precisely what constitutes—or, as she argues, characterizes—one’s personal identity (Schechtman 1996). Generally, narrative theorists take the personal story, or the first-person narrative, to not only be descriptively informative, but also normatively vital to connecting a particular life with the rest of a moral community (or communities), making the story, and the storyteller, both intelligible and open to normative analysis. In other words, theorists who use a narrative approach to ethics take the process of telling and hearing the stories of our lives to be doing something morally significant. For example, feminist philosopher Hilde Lindemann offers the following summary of some possible roles of stories in moral reasoning:

Narrativists have claimed, among other things, that stories of one kind or another are required: (1) to teach us our duties, (2) to guide morally good action, (3) to motivate morally good action, (4) to justify action on moral grounds, (5) to cultivate our moral sensibilities, (6) to enhance our moral perception, (7) to make actions of persons morally intelligible, and (8) to reinvent ourselves as better persons (Nelson 2001, 36).

Thus, narratives can differ teleologically. They can also be judged to be good and bad, desirable and undesirable, truthful and false. Indeed, instead of providing the sort of insight into ourselves that might be constructive and action-guiding, they can encourage dishonesty, cowardice, or can serve to indulge our fantasies in generally unhealthy, or even destructive, ways. Narratives can be “master narratives” that tell us where and how we are socially situated with respect to our duties, claims, and expectations. One can also resist harmful master narratives through a counterstory, whose purpose it is to “root out the master narratives in the tissue of stories that constitute an oppressive identity and replace them with stories that depict the person as morally worthy” (Lindemann 2001, 150). Moreover, one can resist a master narrative through a humorous re-casting of that narrative – a king with no clothes (power), Victor/Victoria (sexuality), and so on – that serves to expose the “master narrative” as unreliable, or at least of doubtful validity. And, of course, the master narratives themselves can differ: while they can oppress, they can also inform, (re)align, and guide. Counterstories, too, can be destructive as well as reparative. What matters is acquiring the ability (and desire) to listen or read closely enough, with sufficient attention and discernment, to tell the difference (Lindemann 2001). Morality, in short, is not solely within the purview of a judge who possesses the necessary moral epistemology and pronounces on a given act as “warranted” or “unwarranted,” but is something that we do together: it is a socially embodied medium of understanding and adjustment in which people engage in practices of allotting, assuming, or deflecting responsibilities of various kinds (Walker 1997). These practices create a vocabulary and resources for moral deliberation that give us recognized and socially shared ways of deciding what is good or right to do.

Since narrative approaches to ethics are not a singular, monolithic whole, the understandings and practices of what it might mean to engage in moral analysis narratively does indeed vary. Narratives can be read, heard or viewed through the mediums of film, literature, or through the oral traditions of storytelling, thus expanding one’s emotional, social, and intellectual vocabulary and perception. In this way, we become not merely better informed about being otherwise, but better equipped in addressing morally complex and difficult situations in the real world (Lindemann 2001; Nussbaum 1990). These narrative techniques can be can be reified by substituting a “master” model of moral reasoning (say, the Enlightenment model of detached objectivity and rationality) with the kind of normativity that is action-guiding to a particular narrative community that wishes to find justification for, and thus make moral sense of, its way of life (Lindemann 2001; MacIntyre 1984). They can also serve as methods of clarification of confusing or contradictory moral reasoning when compared to each other. In trying to work through some particularly difficult moral dilemmas, narratives can help us to see where seemingly divergent viewpoints can possibly move closer together, when they cannot, and why, without resorting to ill-fated attempts to (re)order principles and (re)interpret laws. In short, a narrative approach to doing ethics takes its cues from the stories themselves, as they are told, heard, and (mis)understood, and although there are a number of approaches and methodologies, they tend to center around questions of who the teller is, what the teller might mean, who the intended (and unintended) audience might be, what is the effect of the story, and (perhaps less frequently) what constitutes a good story – and what might be meant, in this case, by “good.” Writing from a narrativist medical ethics perspective, Joan McCarthy suggests that some of the central tenets of narrative approaches to moral issues can be understood as the following:

Every moral situation is unique and unrepeatable and its meaning cannot be fully captured by appealing to law like universal principles.

…[A]ny decision or course of action is justified in terms of its fit with the individual life story or stories…

The objective of the task of justification in 2 is not necessarily to unify moral beliefs and commitments, but is to open up dialogue, challenge received views and norms, and explore tensions between individual and shared meanings. (McCarthy 2003)

Thus, a narrativist account of moral problems, dilemmas, and general questions of moral judgment, takes seriously the multitudes of individual lives, and thus the multitudes of voices and interpretations of moral situations. What matters, then, is not so much a reduction of moral positions to a commonly-held single perspective, but an opening up of a space for reasons and dialogues with equally morally worthy others, thereby expanding the possibility of a shared, rather than a unitary and monolithic, moral universe.

One way to charitably interpret this narrative turn in ethics is to take seriously the proposition that stories simply provide the sort of flexibility of understanding and variability of perspective that deep and “thick” moral work requires. It makes possible a way to engage in moral negotiations by reminding the participants to take into account how they got to the present point, what the present circumstances are, as well what they ought to do in the future. At their best, narrative approaches to ethics welcome voices that, as Young noted, are differently situated, possessing quite radically divergent views of where they fit within the moral and sociopolitical discourses and debates. They remind us that different participants carry the burdens of different histories, epistemologies, and moralities. In the end, the narrative collaborative methodologies see stories as not merely ways to decide among competing principles, but as self-contained, and context-rich, reasons to revise moral understandings, to negotiate solutions, and to continue seeking the ever-elusive common ground (Walker 1997).

4. Feminist Ethics and Narrative

Given the narrative emphasis on multivocality, shared discourse, and the moral significance of individual voices, it is perhaps not entirely surprising that feminist philosophers have both employed and expanded the idea of narrative within feminist philosophy. For example, Margaret Urban Walker, in “Moral Particularity,” has argued that one of the characteristics that make an agent a distinctly moral one is her desire to define herself as the protagonist of a coherent narrative (Walker 2003). The “moral persona” that emerges out of such narrative coherence, she claims elsewhere, is defined by her commitments to individuals, institutions, and values. It is this desire to self-define as a protagonist of a largely coherent narrative that makes one as a moral agent (Walker 1989, 177). Walker later expanded her views to include the narrative notions of collaboration and negotiation into moral work. Perhaps as a way of challenging what she calls the “theoretical-juridical model” of ethics as exemplified by the more traditional top-down theories, her “expressive-collaborative” approach to morality turns on its head both the priorities and its presuppositions of what it means to be engaged in moral practice. As a priority, the expressive-collaborative approach tends to view the importance of moral work not as necessarily the juridical determination of “right” and wrong” based on a set of deduced unyielding norms or laws, but more as a way to negotiate and narrate our way in the complex and imperfect social, physical, and psychological realities of being human: The “expressive-collaborative model” encourages us to view “an investigation of morality as a socially embodied medium of mutual understanding and negotiation between people over their responsibility for things open to human care and response” (Walker 1997, 173). The distinction between this approach and the non-narrative juridical one is that while the latter emphasizes the uniformity of what is required, forbidden, or permitted in a given situation for all similarly-placed agents, the expressive-collaborative model prioritizes moral competence as strong moral self-definition, or, as Walker has argued, “the ability of morally developed persons to install and observe precedents for themselves which are both distinctive of them and binding upon them morally” (Walker 2003). In other words, her argument explicitly makes the point that the work of morality has to do with accountability and responsibility – and thus moral reliability, requiring a certain integrity in one’s relationships, sense of identity, and values. To be accountable is, to some extent, to be viewed as accountable by others, and this means that our actions have to tell a coherent story at least to the extent that they are reasonably predictable by those who are affected by them in the sorts of situations that matter morally. In the end, moral accountability is a narrative practice of making ourselves both internally and externally coherent, and in so becoming, weave ourselves into the fabric of a moral universe (Walker 1989).

Other feminist scholars have also turned to narrative as a way to engage with some of the central concerns within feminist ethical theory. In considering how personal identities structure our various moral discourses and concepts, Hilde Lindemann claims that these identities are “complex narrative constructions consisting of a fluid interaction of the many stories and fragments of stories surrounding the things that seem most important, from one’s own point of view and the point of view of others, about a person over time” (Nelson 2001, 20). She argues that not only are identities, and thus one’s moral standing in society, narratively constituted, she notes, but they can be narratively damaged by oppression and oppressive practices. Indeed, the moral damage of oppressive “master narratives”—destructive especially to those who are already socially subordinated and disempowered—must be counteracted with powerful counter-narratives that just might repair these broken identities, securing individual (and sometimes group) moral agency. The two kinds of moral damage that can impact the cohesion of one’s identity—one, depriving one of important social goods, and the other, of self-respect—can be repaired by, and through, counterstories, which narratively resist, challenge, and overcome the damaging master narratives that are so inflicted by the powerful on the vulnerable (Lindemann 2011). For example, women whose moral agency is compromised because they choose childlessness against a more general pronatalist narrative can offer stories of womanhood as personhood without essentializing the women-as-mother. As noted earlier, these counternarratives can take many forms, but their purpose remains consistent: to both expand normative spaces to include those previously excluded, and to admit, and in fact encourage, the use of narrative as a legitimate practice of engagement within the broader moral and sociopolitical discourses.

Of course, Walker and Lindemann are not the only feminist theorists to turn to narrative. Because feminist theorists are generally concerned with addressing various kinds of oppressions—and especially the oppression of women—they have often construed personal stories as fruitful ways of theorizing morally dilemmatic situations. These accounts serve a number of goals, including clarifying the harms of oppression, explaining the personal costs of cruel, myopic, or marginalizing moral reasoning, re-orienting the purely juridical and theoretical toward the non-ideal, and, among other things, motivating the development of moral thinking in ways that are inclusive of contextualities, situatedness, and burdened lives. Vivid, empathy-producing examples that tend to engage the moral imagination are often used by feminist scholars to focus on specific problems in order to show—and not to simply argue—that issues of sexism, oppression, gross power differentials, exclusion, and domination must be recognized and addressed both theoretically and practically. For example, Sandra Bartky, as a part of her analysis of objectification, offers a story of harassment, catcalls and whistles, noting that her previously unremarkable walk was now a source of identity-threatening humiliation and brutal, othering objectification (Bartky 1990; 1979). Moreover, Susan Brison, as a part of her examination of violence, identity, and the moral work of bearing witness, shares the very personal trauma of her brutal rape and assault. As Anita Superson notes, “Brison argues that the experience of rape should be of interest to philosophers because it raises many philosophical issues, including the metaphysical issue of the disintegration of the self, the epistemological issue of the victim’s skepticism about everyone and everything, as well as the obvious legal, moral, and political issues relating to what it is like to be a victim of rape, why rape occurs and is so prevalent in our society, what its meaning is, and so on” (Superson 2009). Moreover, Susan Estrich employed her own story not just of rape, but of a right for her credibility as a reliable narrator of her experiences as a crime victim to police who did not take her claim to be a serious one (Superson 2009). Through this reliance on a personal narrative of trauma and victimization, she addresses not only the broader challenge of confronting the presuppositions and prejudice inherent in American rape law, but also makes a case, through her personal narrative, for alternative, less abstract and rigid constructions of the notions of force and consent.

Turning to a different aspect of narrative—namely, fiction—the philosopher Martha Nussbaum argues that the narrativity of literature provides a deep and necessary source of moral knowledge that not only more sharply attunes people to the various sources of morality, but also to themselves as sensing moral beings who enter into relationships of mutual responsibilities and obligations with each other (Nussbaum 1990). Finally, Seyla Benhabib has noted that narratives are not only the central constituting elements of a self, but that “[w]e are born into webs of interlocution or into webs of narrative-from the familial and gender narratives to the linguistic one to the macronarrative of one’s collective identity. We become who we are by learning to be a conversation partner in these narratives. Although we do not choose the webs in whose nets we are initially caught or select those with whom we wish to converse, our agency consists in our capacity to weave out of those narratives and fragments of narratives a life story that makes sense for us, as unique individual selves” (Benhabib 1999, 344).

Thus, the process of challenging, re-defining, and finally re-making moral theory and practice that is so central to the project of feminist ethics can, with the help of narrative methodologies, go far toward addressing women’s oppressions, as well as the oppressions of numerous excluded others. By telling their stories—by grounding moral theorizing in personal narratives rather than in purely idealized contexts and agents—feminists scholars are not only able to motivate a deeper understanding of ethical dilemmas, but also advocate for practical changes in the structures of marginalizing social practices by creating a more inclusive space of reasons within which to negotiate our moral understandings.

5. Some Criticisms of Narrative Approaches to Ethics

Even though embraced by a not insignificant number of feminist ethicists, narrative approaches to ethics, whether feminist or otherwise, are not without their critics. While these criticisms are diverse and multifaceted, many of them converge on the worries about narrative’s lack of moral grounding, epistemic justification, and normative guidance. Some concerns stem from a reliance on context, perspective, and circumstances of specific stories, which, for some, drift too close to relativism. Others worry about the dependence on testimony and storytelling as a basis of moral theory. A number of theorists also wonder about the theoretical and practical value of a narrative, contextualized approach for moral theory, broadly construed. Finally, some claim that a narrative approach to understanding one’s place in the moral universe is not only misguided, but unnecessary and not reflective of what matters to us morally as human beings.

First, in addressing worries about relativism, the turn of feminist ethics toward narrative and experiential pluralism might re-make moral theory merely into an account of “historically specific moral practices and traditions” (Jaggar 1991, 93). Alison Jaggar further notes that while feminist ethics is “incompatible with any form of moral relativism that condones the subordination of women or the devaluation of their moral experience…[i]t is neutral, however, between the plural and local understanding of ethics, on the one hand, and then ideal of a universal morality, on the other” (Brennan 1999, 862, citing Jaggar 1991, 94). Thus it would seem that worry about the slide of feminist narrative-based theory into moral relativism is at least prima facie warranted: Ought feminist theorists relying on narratives focus on the local and the contextualized, rather than on the abstract and universalizing, if so doing offers an expansion of new “political agendas” (Shrage 1994) while at the same time leading practitioner to accept practices and narratives that might contribute to other kinds of oppressions (Brennan 1999)? Perhaps if identity-and-moral-community-defining stories are to have any kind of moral grounding that are both useful and reasonably defensible, then Susan Sherwin’s suggestion that it is the revisable and process-dependent “community standards” that might offer something beyond a fully relativistic and situational ethics is one way out of the worries about relativism (Brennan 1999; Sherwin 1992).

Second, Diana Tietjens Meyers, concerned about the reliability of testimony, suggests that narrative theory, instead of simply looking to storytelling as its sources of normativity, must prove its credibility as an account of morality by insisting on a particular skill set of the storyteller. She argues: “To ensure respect for the diversity of morally decent lives, narrativity theory must explicate the credibility of self-narratives in terms of this repertoire of skills. Self-narratives are not all equally valid, revealing, and conducive to flourishing, but there is no property internal to self-narratives nor any interpersonal test that can rank them. The best gauge of a self-narrative’s credibility, then, is the narrator’s overall degree of mastery of the self-discovery, self-definition, and self-direction skill repertoire and the extent to which the narrator made use of this competency in constructing a particular self-narrative” (Meyers 2004,303). Meyers claims that if narratives are simply taken at face value, we might be left with “all sorts of fictions—fairy tales, negative utopias, science fiction, romances, and horror stories—as well as autobiographical narratives” (Meyers 2004, 303). Simply because a story is good or interesting, Meyers notes, it does not guarantee that it will be anything but an exercise in wishful fiction or a flight of fancy. In order to properly address this possibility, one must acquire particular skills—introspection, volition, nurturing, communication, listening, and memory, among others—that allow one to recall relevant experiences, to imagine feasible options, and so on (Meyers 2004). Indeed, Meyers insists that “[t]o curb overactive imaginations, to overcome isolating silence, and to secure the credibility of self-narratives, the competency that keeps people attuned to themselves and alive to life’s possibilities must underwrite the processes of self-narrating” (Meyers 2004,303). Without this kind of rigorous self-discipline, a narrative approach to morality seems at best less than fully credible, and at worst, a methodologically compromised enterprise that confuses the interesting and the exciting with the epistemically important and the morally compelling.

Third, another kind of critique of narrative is offered by the philosopher and bioethicist Tom Tomlinson, focused on the worry about whether a narrative approach to ethics brings something distinct to moral theory that other, more traditional, approaches do not (Tomlinson 1997). Tomlinson argues that even though narrative might be methodologically important to the development of ethical reasoning, it does not offer “a mode of ethical justification that is independent from or superior to appeals to moral principles” (Tomlinson 1997, 132). On his view, narrative does not serve the sort of “central epistemic function in the discovery, justification, or application of ethical knowledge” that its supporters take it to be serving (Tomlinson 1997, 124). Instead, he argues that a focus on stories does not go far enough – or, indeed, any distance at all – toward enriching our moral epistemology. If narrative sets itself against the overstructured and sterile methodology of juridical thinking, then, Tomlinson claims, we ought to expect to find something morally valuable that is unavailable to us through principles alone. However, this does not seem to be the case: First, if one takes the kind of narrative approach that Martha Nussbaum has proposed—whereby engaging with certain kinds of literature allows for the development of a more nuanced, and empathetic, view of moral discourse (Nussbaum 1990)—and reads a novel in order to broaden one’s moral imagination, one is missing the actual encounter with a living person, and is thus epistemically and morally limited by the four corners of the text. Whatever moral “truth” is made available by the story, it seems limited situationally to the characters within that story, and does very little to speak to those who do not also share the world in which a particular moral lesson unfolds. And even if one were to set aside literary narrative and enter into a conversation with other people, the sort of particular knowledge one might derive through these interactions would not yield any moral knowledge that is generalizeable—that translates from one story, or from one storyteller, to another. At best, Tomlinson suggest, “novels and stories become…vivid illustrations of knowledge verified through other means” (Tomlinson 1997,125).

On Tomlinson’s account then, narrative does not appear to have much to contribute toward assisting the ethical discourse about aligning, or at least making less attenuated, the relationship between moral principles and lived experiences. Indeed, Tomlinson sees no clear way to distinguish how a uniquely narrative approach helps with addressing ethical dilemmas from other methodologies. For example, in a case where one is torn between disclosing or withholding potentially devastating news, a narrative theorist might require a consideration of how much truth to tell, how to tell it, how one will hear what is said, who is doing the speaking, and so on. However, Tomlinson suggests that aside from the vagueness of the narrative criteria itself, what it might mean to “interpret” this information is unclear: “Any social system of reasoned reflection involves a ‘communal dialogue’ of ‘give and take,’ including those deliberatively rooted in principles…The failure to provide any more precise account of the nature and role of ‘interpretation’ is a symptom of the tendency to wave it and ‘narrative’ as banners that fly over everything bright and beautiful being ignored by those crude and insensitive principles” (Tomlinson 1997, 127).

Moreover, Tomlinson rejects what he views as the tendency among proponents of narrative ethics to conflate the descriptive claim that one’s life is best understood as a narrative with the normative claim that one’s choices – and especially one’s moral choices – ought to be judged according to their coherence with a given life narrative. First, we do not, he claims, live a life that can be forced into coherence by a storyline – or by anything else: “we don’t live out a narrative, we create one by living a life” (Tomlinson 1997, 130). Second, even if we were to take seriously the narrative we create by “living a life,” “the [moral] question of how best to live out ‘that’ unity is not answered by the notion of narrative unity. It’s answered by appeal to extranarrative ideals that elevate some kinds of narrative over others” (Tomlinson 1997, 130). And since these ideals can be whatever one desires them to be, the resulting coherence loses any meaningful normative force. Unless one subscribes to one “extranarrative” ideal – or, indeed, to one principle – over another, the standard of narrative coherence seems to neither add anything to principlist analysis, nor offer an epistemically independent criteria of ethical reasoning, explanation, or justification.

While Tomlinson’s arguments focus on the claim that narratives do not offer any ethically or epistemically satisfying criteria that we could use in making moral choices, another kind of criticism, offered by John Arras, centers on the moral incompleteness of narrative as moral theory. Although he takes a somewhat more conciliatory, although still critical, view, his dissatisfaction with narrative as a method for doing ethics is grounded in his suspicion of narrative as a means of grounding moral justification—of finding the relationship “between the telling of a story and the establishment of a warrant for believing in the moral adequacy or excellence of a particular action, policy or character.” Having examined what he takes to be three different approaches to narrative—“as an essential element of any and all ethical analyses,” as an ahistorical rejection of the Enlightenment project, and as a postmodern attempt to substitute narrative “for the entire enterprise of moral justification”—he concludes that, while narrative seems to be an important part of ethical analysis, its ability to completely replace principles and ethical theory seems doubtful at best if what one seeks is moral justification for actions (Arras 1997, 79-85). Arras’s view, therefore, is that narrative seems to be merely supplementary to principles, and, in the end, is no threat to their moral primacy.

Finally, Galen Strawson, in “Against Narrativity,” argues that a narrative approach (to morality, to identity, and so on) is not only presumptively false from a folk-psychological, or common-sense perspective, but is also descriptively vague and normatively unmoored. He claims that not only does he not see himself or his life in narrative terms, but that he resents the idea of such a practice altogether. In response to the urging of (feminist and other) narrative theorists to engage in moral work through narrative, Strawson wonders, “Why on earth, in the midst of the beauty of being, it should be thought to be important to do this” (Strawson 2004, 436). Indeed, he noted there are deeply non-Narrative people and there are good ways to live that are deeply non-Narrative” (Eakin 2006, 180-187). Moral claims about oneself, about others, or about the world more broadly, Strawson insists, do not require the reliance on stories, or on how these stories relate to one’s present and future agency and shared moral understandings.

6. Conclusion

It can be said with some certainty that narrative approaches to ethics are not without considerable controversies and passionate critiques. It also seems clear that there are significant and challenging insights offered by narrative ethicists—a number of which have been theorized, defended, and expanded upon by feminist ethicists. Indeed, it seems that feminist ethics and narrative approaches to normativity do indeed share a number of concerns, goals, and motivations that offer powerful counterstories to the largely principlist, abstract, and universalizing practices of traditional moral theory. But shared worries and a desire for a more multivocal and collaborative moral discourse do not presuppose, nor require, the same methodologies, and there are some clear and powerful points of disagreement both within feminist philosophy about the role of narrative in ethical theory, as well as among narrativists themselves about what kinds of narratives ought to count as properly normative and adequately action-guiding. Because there is not a single approach to feminist ethics, and certainly no single way of engaging in narrative analysis, it is quite difficult to make any tidy generalizations, either about the theories themselves, or about their complicated relationship. Yet perhaps this is exactly the point: theorizing that tends to move away from such generalization in its own methodologies unsurprisingly escapes any attempts at totalizing definitions, in the process changing and restructuring the spaces and scope of moral discourse.

7. References and Further Reading

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Benson, P. “Feminist Intuitions and the Normative Substance of Autonomy.” Personal Autonomy: New Essays on Personal Autonomy and its Role in Contemporary Philosophy, Ed. James Stacey Taylor. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
Brennan, S. “Recent Work in Feminist Ethics.” Ethics 109.4 (1999): 858-893.
Brison, S. J.. “Surviving Sexual Violence: A Philosophical Perspective.” In S.G. French, W. Teays, and L. M. Purdy (eds.) Violence Against Women: Philosophical Perspectives. Ithaca, New York: Cornell University Press, 1998.
Charon, R. “Narrative Medicine: Attention, Representation, Affiliation.” Narrative 13.3 (2005): 261-270.
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Eakin, P. J. “Narrative Identity and Narrative Imperialism: A Response to Galen Strawson and James Phelan.” Narrative 14.2 (2006): 180-187.
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Lindemann, H. Holding and Letting Go: The Social Practice of Personal Identity. New York: Oxford University Press, 2014.
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Young, I. M. On Female Body Experience: “Throwing Like a Girl” and Other Essays. New York: Oxford University Press, 2005.

Author Information

Anna Gotlib
Email: AGotlib@brooklyn.cuny.edu
Brooklyn College of City University of New York
U. S. A.

Charles Hartshorne: Neoclassical Metaphysics

Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000) was an intrepid defender of the claims of metaphysics in a century characterized by its anti-metaphysical genius. While many influential voices were explaining what speculative philosophy could not accomplish or even proclaiming an end to it, Hartshorne was trying to show what speculative philosophy could accomplish. Metaphysics, he said, has a future as well as a past. He believed that the history of philosophy exhibits genuine, albeit halting and uneven, progress towards a comprehensive understanding of the nature of existence.

Philosophy was, for him, a dialogue that spans centuries, with partners whose wisdom has a perennial relevance. The two philosophers who most influenced him, and in whose work he found the greatest parallels with his own thinking, were Charles Sanders Peirce and Alfred North Whitehead. Hartshorne was co-editor with Paul Weiss of the first comprehensive edition of Peirce’s philosophical papers, and he served as Whitehead’s assistant during the most metaphysically creative period of the Englishman’s career.

Hartshorne considered the metaphysical views he had begun to develop in his 1923 dissertation as, to a great extent, in pre-established harmony with Whitehead’s philosophy of organism. He indicated that Whitehead helped him sharpen his ideas and gave him a better vocabulary to express them, although there remained important differences between the two philosophers. One difference is that theism was always a central element of Hartshorne’s metaphysics (addressed briefly here, but see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism” and “Charles Hartshorne: Theistic and Anti-theistic Arguments”) whereas Whitehead was preoccupied for much of his career with a philosophy of nature and did not introduce God until he developed the speculative philosophy of his later works.

The Nature Metaphysics
The Question of Method in Metaphysics
Neoclassical Metaphysics
Conclusion: Hartshorne’s Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. The Nature Metaphysics

After his first book on sensation, Hartshorne’s philosophical work focused mostly on the questions of metaphysics (see “Charles Hartshorne: Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation”). In Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method, he provides no fewer than a dozen definitions of “metaphysics” which, he argued, differ only as a matter of emphasis. Central to all of Hartshorne’s definitions is that genuinely metaphysical propositions are unconditionally necessary and non-restrictive of existential possibilities. If metaphysical propositions are true at all, they hold true of all possible world-states or state-descriptions. This means that they are propositions which are illustrated or exemplified by any conceivable observations or experiences when such observations or experiences are properly understood or reflected upon.

“Conceivable observation” is here understood in terms of Karl Popper’s notion that observation is always of the form “such and such is the case” rather than “such and such is not the case.” Cognitive definiteness is gained only by noting what is observed, rather than what is not observed, which is indefinite or infinite. Plato argues that negation is parasitic upon affirmation—“that which is not” is not contrary to what exists, but something different than what exists (Sophist 257b). In effect, quantificational criteria for identity can apply only to events that occur, not events which do not occur. The question, “How many storms did not occur?” has no definite answer. In Hartshorne’s view, there are no merely negative facts. Every negation presupposes some actually existing state of affairs. For example, to say that there are no swans in the lake is to say that every part of the lake is occupied by something other than a swan. Or, more generally, to say that swans do not exist is tantamount to saying that every location in the universe is occupied by something other than a swan. Sheer denials (claims purporting to state negative facts) represent an absence of positivity, and this is a key feature of metaphysical error. Properly metaphysical propositions are unique in never being falsified by any actual or genuinely possible states of affairs and in always being verified by actual or genuinely possible states of affairs. They represent, in effect, the kind of necessity defined since Leibniz and found in modern modal logic as “that which is common to all possibilities.”

This distinguishes genuinely metaphysical propositions from other kinds of a priori necessary propositions, such as truths of mathematics and hypothetical necessities. In Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method (p. 162), Hartshorne maintains that mathematical propositions are non-existential, for they express relations between conceivable states of affairs. “Two apples plus two apples equals four apples” is an existential assertion containing a true mathematical relation, but “two slithy toves plus two slithy toves equals four slithy toves” is a non-existential assertion that nonetheless contains the same true mathematical relation. The bare arithmetic truth that “2 + 2 = 4” is neutral to existential instantiation. Similarly, “The number nine is not integrally divisible by two” is necessarily the case given the conventional meanings of the vocabulary of finite arithmetic. However, although no conceivable state of affairs falsifies the proposition, it is not verified by any conceivable state of affairs. And while hypothetical necessities express necessary relationships between possibilities, Hartshorne takes them to be covert denials that there are any states of affairs which falsify the relation asserted by the conditional. By contrast, genuinely metaphysical propositions are unequivocally affirmative, and their denials can only be sheer denials (as described above), expressions of utter absence or privation. The denials of metaphysical propositions are impossibilities; they are failed attempts to represent that which would never be found among possibilities.

As a prime illustration of a metaphysical truth, Hartshorne used the proposition, “Something exists.” This is properly metaphysical since it could not be falsified under any conceivable observational or experiential circumstances, yet it could be verified by every such circumstance; in fact, to assert both of these features is to assert something that is analytically true of the proposition, since any attempt to verify the proposition would posit, at minimum, a verification-event which would in turn falsify the counter-proposition that “nothing exists.” Some philosophers suggest that it is a contingent truth that something exists, as seems to be assumed by the question, “Why is there something rather than nothing?” In Creative Evolution, Henri Bergson said that one could attempt to arrive at the idea of nonbeing by imaginatively negating every true statement asserting the existence of something. Hartshorne points out, following Bergson, that this thought experiment is self-defeating. It ends in one of two ways: either there is no assertion, but only a denial, or there is an assertion that is self-referentially incoherent such as, “Nonexistence exists.” It is logically kindred to such “nonsense” propositions as “I was told something by nobody” or “I ate nothingness.” There is literally no possible state of affairs that could make “Nothing exists” true. If it is impossible for “Nothing exists” to be true then “Something exists” must be necessarily true.

If Hartshorne is correct that it is impossible for “Nothing exists” to be true, then there can be no state of affairs that meaningfully contrasts with “Something exists.” To say that it is necessary that something exists does not provide any information about any existing thing; in other words, “Something exists” is too abstract to tell one about the concretely existing things (pluralism) or thing (monism) that may exist. This observation, however, presupposes the contrast between the abstract and the concrete. A further metaphysical question, therefore, is the relation that exists between the abstract and the concrete. “Something exists” does not describe an existing thing but rather presupposes the existence of entities (or an entity) more concrete than the sentence itself—this is the case even if, per impossibile, only the sentence existed, for “Something exists” is more abstract than “Only the sentence ‘something exists’ exists.” In light of these kinds of considerations, Hartshorne concludes not only that “Something exists” is necessarily true but also that “Something concrete exists” is as well, where the adjective “concrete” is the contrary of “abstract.” There is a hint of paradox in the fact that “concreteness” is itself abstract, but this leads to another of Hartshorne’s definitions of metaphysics as the study of the abstraction “concreteness.” Indeed, Hartshorne maintains that all metaphysical mistakes are instances of what Whitehead called “the fallacy of misplaced concreteness,” that it is to say, of mistaking an abstraction for what is concrete.

Conceivable propositions involve conceivable states of affairs in order for them to count intelligibly as propositions. Natural deduction systems of modern symbolic logic seem to make this supposition as in the decision of Whitehead and Russell in Principia Mathematica to make “there exists something X which either does or does not have an arbitrary one-place predicate P” axiomatic: in effect, they disallow an empty universe of discourse since an empty universe produces incoherence in the system such as counter-instances to the law of Universal Instantiation. While it is to be granted that free logics can avoid this assumption, it is also true that free logics entail difficulties precisely in determining their semantical domains. Most important, free logics that are designed to formalize ordinary language presuppose “objects” in both their inner or outer domains. Despite such monikers as “null inner domains,” such domains assume objects that are non-actual possibles. All free logics that have cognitive import for the description of “possible worlds” assume a semantical domain of objects that are conceptualized on the basis of actual objects or properties; for example, “Batman is a superhero” can be formalized in free logic, but it ultimately makes oblique reference to actualities (bat ears, masks, muscular strength, courage, and so forth) that are posed in non-actual combinations or juxtapositions. In effect, free logics can be interpreted in such a way that they do not contradict basic tenets of Hartshorne’s modal theory. Where cognitively meaningful, they assume objects as values for variables, and they formalize fictional scenarios that indirectly display the conceptual priority of actualities.

Hartshorne contrasts metaphysical propositions with empirical and contingent propositions, which are restrictive of some existential possibilities. An empirical proposition is essentially restrictive, always involving an actualization of a state of affairs that excludes other possible alternatives. For example, “Barack Obama resides in the White House during 2011” tells us about states of affairs obtaining in the White House during 2011, and it tacitly excludes the state of affairs of John McCain, his opponent in the 2008 presidential election, residing in the White House during 2011. This feature of exclusion among alternative possibilities is definitive of contingency, and, for Hartshorne, follows from Leibniz’s insight that the scope of disjunctive possibilities cannot be actualized simultaneously or conjunctively, since there are incompossible possibilities. Thus, the selection among possibilities confronted by natural processes must involve the acceptance of one alternative and the rejection of others, and this is a signature feature of empirical propositions. Hartshorne never considered the many-worlds interpretation of quantum theory, which by virtue of quantum branching into conjunctively realized alternative space-times, denies Leibniz’s principle of contingency as exclusion of alternatives. (For a critique of the so-called “actualist” account of many-worlds ontology and defense of the coherence of process philosophy and quantum theory, see Shields 2008.)

If empirical propositions are essentially restrictive, it follows that every empirical state of affairs is positive, but has negative implications. The denial of these negative implications is also an empirical state of affairs. For example, one alternative to Obama’s having won the 2008 presidential election is Hillary Clinton’s having won it. Since this alternative did not occur, the denial of this alternative, namely, “Hillary Clinton did not win the 2008 presidential election” is true of the actual world. However, if an empirical proposition is one which excludes alternatives, how is this true of negative empirical implications of such propositions? Is not a negative empirical proposition simply an assertion of an absence or privation? Hartshorne holds that this is clearly not the case. What is excluded from actualization in the above negative empirical statement is Hillary Clinton’s winning the 2008 presidential election, and this exclusion is achieved by a positive state of affairs. Positivity and exclusion of possibilities are thus features of all empirical propositions. Thus, unlike metaphysical propositions, empirical propositions have both an affirmative and a negative logical quality.

The division between metaphysics and empirical science is, in principle, clear. Hartshorne notes that, in practice, it is not always clear which statements count as empirical and which as metaphysical. It is well to keep in mind that Hartshorne uses Popper’s idea about falsifiability as a criterion of what it means to be an empirical statement and not as the guiding method of empirical science. Popper elevated falsification over verification as the proper method of science. Hartshorne does not address in a systematic way the question of the proper methods of science; even so, showing that a given statement is falsifiable is, on Hartshorne’s principles, one way in which it can be discredited as a true metaphysical idea. If a true metaphysical claim is falsified by no conceivable observation it is also the case that it is verified by every conceivable observation. Hartshorne holds that verifiability fails as a criterion for empirical statements but succeeds as a criterion for true metaphysical statements. It follows that false metaphysical ideas are falsified by every conceivable observation and verified by none.

A nuanced issue emerges, however, when one considers particular case studies of the relationship between metaphysical and empirical propositions in Hartshorne’s theory. Some critics have urged that Hartshorne’s neoclassical positions may sometimes conflict with apparently well-corroborated empirical scientific hypotheses. Among other hypotheses, these include (i) the apparent empirical result from special relativity theory that there is no cosmic simultaneity and thus no privileged or divine time (Hartshorne’s theory of deity posits a temporal God), or (ii) the beginning of physical events in space-time a finite time ago as posited in standard hot big bang cosmologies (Hartshorne’s metaphysics of creativity posits an infinite past of cosmic epochs, the latest of which is our actual cosmos since the purported big bang event). Such apparent conflicts, however, do not actually speak to Hartshorne’s general theory of the difference between metaphysical and empirical propositions. Rather, they concern whether the specific propositions he proposes as metaphysical are in fact illustrated by any conceivable state of affairs.

While Hartshorne can be described as a kind of rationalist insofar as he maintains, like classical rationalists such as Descartes and Leibniz, that metaphysics is a matter of consistent and adequate meanings of concepts, he is hardly a dogmatic “armchair” or purely speculative philosopher who desires no engagement with the special empirical sciences—his first and thirteenth books demonstrate that he was a serious psychologist and ornithologist. His rationalism is in fact “critical” and rather severely qualified. For instance, a propos of the above comment regarding the question of the “success” of his metaphysical project, Hartshorne speaks in Creative Synthesis (Ch. II) of metaphysics as our quite “contingent ways of trying to become conscious of the non-contingent ground of contingency,” and he insists on the qualification that the notion of the a priori should hardly be conflated with the epistemic notion of “certainty.” With Whitehead, Hartshorne insists that philosophers should be epistemically wary by avoiding the “dogmatic fallacy” such as found in the confidence of the Continental rationalists. In “The Development of My Philosophy” (1970) Hartshorne declares, “All philosophizing is risky: cognitive security is for God, not for us.”

There are at least three considerations which make it clear that, at the very least, it is not obvious that Hartshorne’s neoclassical metaphysics conflicts with the above mentioned empirical hypotheses, or that he is cavalier about empirical challenges. Following Popperian distinctions, Hartshorne never claimed that his proposed metaphysics is in principle exempt from empirical disconfirmation, although it is exempt from the quite distinct notion of empirical confirmation. If a “metaphysical” proposal really does conflict with an empirical fact, then it is disconfirmed and fails to be a genuinely metaphysical proposition. No genuinely metaphysical proposition, however, could be “empirically confirmed” in the standard sense that some restrictive state of affairs as opposed to another illustrates the proposition, because this would deny the universality of the candidate metaphysical proposition’s requirement that it be illustrative of any conceivable state of affairs. This requirement does not prevent it from being the case that some states of affairs are phenomenologically “privileged” in the sense that certain metaphysical truths may be more readily apparent in special cases of phenomena. Hartshorne agrees with the early Heidegger that metaphysics can be about profoundly general concepts, yet such concepts are neither phenomenologically vacuous nor inexplicable nor utterly without discernible structure. For instance, the process metaphysical theory of the necessarily “social structure of all experience” might be seen with particular clarity via the special phenomenon of the “active concern” (Heidegger’s sorge) of human being.

The determination of the relevant “empirical facts” (or interpretations of them) which a philosopher is forced to accept is a subtle, highly theory-dependent and much disputed matter, especially regarding the above mentioned cases of relativity theory and big bang cosmology. For example, it is not clear or agreed upon by philosophers of science that relativity physics establishes that time is “relative” even in Newton’s sense or that special relativity robs us of any objective, uniform notion of temporal modes of past, present, or future; nor is it clear that the standard big bang model, even if sound, “proves” the absolute finitude of either time or creative process as such. W. H. Newton-Smith, in The Structure of Time, argues that the notion of an “empirical” proof of a beginning of time even when granting a big bang singularity is highly problematic.

Hartshorne was cognizant of the prima facie tensions between relativity and big bang theory and his neoclassical metaphysics, and he offered plausible conciliatory suggestions: For example, consider his embrace of quantum physicist H. P. Stapp’s notion of a primordial, asymmetrically well-ordered sequence of events upon which space-time location is dependent. Stapp’s idea harmonizes the relativity of spatio-temporal observations dependent upon light-cone propagation and the ultimacy of ontological asymmetry demanded by process theory. Consider also Hartshorne’s observation that big bang theory establishes, at most, the contingent origin and present physical chronometry of time appropriate to our “cosmic epoch.” At any rate, whether or not these conciliatory suggestions are successful, Hartshorne attempted to follow through with the directives of his theory of metaphysics. As he says in Creative Synthesis, “there must be an at least possible way of harmonizing what physicists say is true of our epoch and what metaphysicians say is true of all possible epochs (since it forms the content of ideas of such generality that there is nothing we can think which is not a specialization of this content).”

2. The Question of Method in Metaphysics

That Hartshorne thought at length about questions of philosophical method can be inferred from what Paul Weiss called the systematic “machinery” at work in his metaphysics, and from the very title of one his most important mature philosophical works, Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method. Hartshorne’s method for neoclassical metaphysics results from both original insights and critical reflection on a wide swath of variegated influences. These range from the work of American pragmatists (especially Peirce), to phenomenology, to the speculative thought of Whitehead, to the work of analytic philosophers (with particular attention given to Popper and the logical investigations of his Harvard teachers Lewis and Sheffer as well as his University of Chicago colleague Carnap). The section titled “Reply to Everybody” published in The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne lists no fewer than twenty-one methodological principles to be used in the proper adjudication of metaphysical claims. Among the most important of these are what could be termed the principles of “positivity,” of “dipolar contrast,” of “inclusive asymmetry,” and of Peirce’s doctrine of “position matrices or diagrams.” We explained the principle of positivity, or the rejection of purely negative facts, in the previous section, so let us turn to a discussion of the other principles.

a. Dipolarity

Hartshorne’s principle of dipolar contrast derives, in part, from the semantic “law of polarity” found in Morris R. Cohen’s A Preface to Logic. Following Cohen, Hartshorne holds that genuine metaphysical concepts are semantically interdependent. In effect, such concepts have logical contraries which cannot mean anything in utter isolation from one another. In spite of the extreme generality of metaphysical concepts, each such concept entails a polar contrast to it. Even the highly general concept “reality” requires that the concept “unreality” be assigned some meaning. To use Hartshorne’s illustration, the concept of “reality” ought to include the notion of having mental states, but the concept of “unreality” should include the notion of intentional objects of real mental acts which fail to designate anything extra-mental. Perhaps a more telling example could be found in the notion of necessity. A standard definition of necessity is “that which has no alternative,” yet alternativeness clearly invokes contingency, since a contingent state of affairs is to be characterized as “this rather than that alternative.” Hence, the semantical analysis of necessity invokes contingency. For Hartshorne, then, each metaphysical concept has a corresponding contrast: necessity requires contingency, being requires becoming, unity requires variety, and so on, for any concept that is non-restrictively general, having applicability across possible states or state-descriptions. The two interdependent contraries in each case warrant the term dipolarity.

Lack of recognition of dipolarity is, for Hartshorne, a chief difficulty in previous metaphysical theories that suppress expression of a polar contrast. In effect, they suffer from a certain conceptual poverty or “fallacy of monopolarity.” Monopolar theories allow expression of only one pole of a pair of contrasts; stated obversely, they completely deny one pole of a pair of contrasts. One example of denying dipolarity is monistic theories such as that of Spinoza, which allow causal necessity and internal relatedness, but which disallow contingency and external relatedness. At the opposite “monopolar” extreme are logical atomist theories like that of Russell, which allow causal contingency and external relatedness, but which disallow causal necessity or internal relatedness. Hartshorne asks if these contrary extremes make any more sense than supposing that doors must have hinges on both sides or on neither side. Hartshorne’s metaphysical project is guided by the observance of dipolarity and thus conceptual inclusiveness; in his view, a neoclassical process theory of reality is structurally dipolar and offers comprehensive accommodation of both necessity and contingency, both causal determination and a degree of freedom from such determination, both internal and external relations, and so forth, throughout the range of metaphysical polar contrasts.

b. Inclusive Asymmetry/Concrete Inclusion

Hartshorne’s principle of dipolarity is complemented and qualified by a principle of inclusive asymmetry or concrete inclusion. As Hartshorne points out, the principle of dipolarity does not justify metaphysical dualism. One should distinguish between asserting that a metaphysical concept requires a contrary polar conception in its definition, and asserting that two polar concepts have an equivalent metaphysical status. It may well be the case that one concept requires the other polar concept in its definition, while the other polar concept both requires the polar contrast in its definition, and yet is itself the ground or source of that polar contrast. In other words, it may be the case, as Hartshorne asserts, that dipolarity is itself grounded in a logically asymmetrical relation between the contraries.

The model for this relation can be seen in logical implication, which Hartshorne, following Peirce’s trail-blazing work on “illation” as logically fundamental or primal, takes to be the ultimate concept in formal logic and a resource for metaphysical generalization. “p implies q” means that p both implies itself and q. This can be formally expressed in the tautology that (p ⊃ q) iff [(p ⊃ p) & (p ⊃ q)]. (This result is mirrored in Lewisian systems in which the formula—changing material implication to strict implication—is a theorem.) However, given a standard material implication, p ⊃ q (where p and q are not equivalent in meaning), we cannot say conversely that q logically implies p. This is reflected in the fact that the correlative formula (p ⊃ q) iff [(q ⊃ q) & (q ⊃ p)] is not a tautology, for it is false on the truth-tabular conditions that p and q have opposite truth values, and thus implicitly involves a species of “fallacy of affirming the consequent.” (Analogously, the similar formula using strict implication is not a theorem.) Thus, entailment is essentially asymmetrical.

Consider furthermore the defining power of variant connectives of standard systems of propositional logic. For Hartshorne, it is immensely significant that the defining power of propositional operators or functions “varies inversely with symmetry.” The symmetrical function of logical equivalence, as in “p if and only if q,” has the least defining power of the propositional functions, since, even when combined with negation, it can be used to produce only eight (including itself) out of the sixteen propositional functions. On the other hand, the directional or asymmetrical functions, which contrast with the equivalence function, are constitutive of entailment. Hartshorne points out that Peirce, and then Sheffer, were the first to see that either the combination of negation and conjunction (“not both”) or the combination of conjunction and negation (“neither/nor”) are singly sufficient to define all the others.

The Sheffer functions (the “stroke” and “daggar”) are the most definitive functions, but they possess a triadic asymmetry that yet includes dyadic symmetry. We see this, Hartshorne notes, in their truth-tabular definitions. The Sheffer stroke is false if and only if both propositional variables are true, while the Sheffer daggar (also Peirce’s ampheck) is true if and only if both propositional variables are false. In effect, the triadic relation of the stroke, that is, the truth-value product of the binary Sheffer construction p|q, which is dyadically symmetrical in terms of its propositional truth-value assignments (p is true and q is true), stands as an asymmetry in terms of its truth value (that is, it is false in relation to symmetrical truth). Hartshorne finds a metaphysically ultimate pattern here, namely, symmetry within an all-embracing asymmetry.

Hartshorne holds that the relation between dipolar metaphysical contraries exhibits this asymmetrical structure. As an illustration, consider his argument in Creative Synthesis that “becoming” logically contains its polar contrast “being,” but not the converse. Suppose there is a reality, X, that does not come to be, that is eternal, and another reality, Y, that does come to be. The total reality, XY, is not eternal; XY comes to be, for Y itself is not eternal. This shows that becoming is the more inclusive category, for it preserves itself (becoming) and its polar contrast (being). No comparable argument can show that being can include becoming without destroying the contrast. The concrete or definite, the creatively cumulative, is the inclusive element, and is the key to the abstract, not vice versa. The concrete and the abstract are neither sheer conjuncts as posited by varieties of dualism, nor some mysterious “third” entity, but, in consonance with both Whitehead’s ontological principle and Aristotle’s ontological priority of the actual, is rather, “the abstract in the concrete.”

In his “Logic of Ultimate Contrasts” (Creative Synthesis, Ch. VI and Zero Fallacy, Ch. VII), Hartshorne calls the concrete terms in a pair of metaphysical contraries the r-terms (correlated with Peirce’s categoreal “seconds” and “thirds”), while abstract terms are called a-terms (correlated with Peirce’s categoreal “firsts”). While he provides 21 r-terms and 21 a-terms in his table of metaphysical contraries, a few samples could be taken as illustrative, especially given his Rule of Proportionality, namely: as any one r-term stands to its contextually correlated a-term, all other r-terms stand to their contextually correlated a-terms.

Hartshorne argues that each r-term includes its correlative a-term, but not vice versa. Given the items above, we see that, for Hartshorne, the analysis of experience should be constructed so as to include the notions that objects or things experienced are independent of or externally related to the contingent acts of experience which include the objects as their necessary (but not sufficient) conditions. If correct, these conceptual relations all exhibit the essential asymmetry of entailment. Yet, there is a two-way necessity within this overall asymmetry, for while the relation of logical inclusion falls always on the r-term side of the table, a-terms nonetheless necessitate that “a class of suitable r-term correlates be non-empty.” For example, the necessary can be expressed, Hartshorne contends, as “the non-emptiness of the class of contingent states of affairs.” (This particular rumination is a key feature of Hartshorne’s revision of the ontological argument; see “Charles Hartshorne: Theistic and Anti-theistic Arguments”.)

While the detailed arguments for and against proper adjudication of each case of r-term/a-term relation is a complex affair that cannot be presented here, it is interesting to notice that some independent considerations of modern logic arguably shore up Hartshorne’s basic principle of r-term inclusion. For example, Hartshorne pointed to the fact that an important theorem of contemporary modal logic “mirrors” the logical inclusiveness of contingent concreta or “r-terms” in juxtaposition with the abstract necessity or “a-terms,” namely, the theorem that [(Np & ~ Nq) ⊃ ~ N(p & q)], where N is a modal operator for “necessarily.” In effect, the conjunction of necessary and contingent propositions logically entails the modally contingent status of the conjunction of assertoric propositions—in effect, contingency in a relevant sense “includes” necessity rather than vice versa.

c. Position Matrices

Hartshorne also holds that metaphysical theories can be tested by subjecting them to processes of rational elimination and/or comparison of cognitive costs that begin with a formal logical elaboration of theoretical possibilities. This idea has its origin in Peirce’s doctrine of position matrices or diagrams. The point here is that no philosophical topic can be declared fully rationally adjudicated until the constituent fundamental aspects of that topic have been subjected to an exhaustive “mathematical analysis.” Much error can occur unless and until all possibilities have been foreseen and subjected to thorough rational consideration. Consider the issue of the God-world relationship in philosophical theology. Hartshorne argues that there are sixteen combinatorial possibilities for theological and atheological models of this relationship when we notice that the concepts of God and world can each be either ontologically necessary, ontologically contingent, can possess these modal properties in diverse aspects, or are neither ontologically necessary nor contingent. In the following matrix, upper case letters (N and C) represent ontological modalities as applied to God and lower case letters (n and c) represent ontological modalities as applied to the world. The zero case (O) represents lack of modal status or impossibility:

Hartshorne’s matrix provides a method of making distinctions among various types of historically significant worldviews as well as highlighting the distinctiveness of his own position. For example: Parmenidean monism or classic Advaita Vedanta can be symbolized as N.o; early Buddhist thought is O.cn; Aristotle’s theism is N.cn; Aquinas’ theism is N.c; Stoic and Spinozistic pantheism is N.n; LaPlacean atheism is O.n; John Stuart Mill’s theism and most forms of deism are C.n; William James’s theism is C.c; Jules Lequyer’s is NC.c; Bertrand Russell’s atheism is O.c. Hartshorne argued that his preferred option (NC.nc) is the most formally inclusive of the theoretical options, and that no specific options are logically compossible (otherwise we would have modal incoherence or contradiction).

Hartshorne’s presentation of the position matrix representing necessity and contingency as applied to God and world developed over the course of his career. He did not come to the four-row, four-column arrangement until after his ninetieth birthday, with the help of Joseph Pickle at Colorado College. A more substantive change was in the way that Hartshorne interpreted the zeros. In Creative Synthesis, the zeros are the atheistic and acosmic positions. In later discussions, however, he interprets the zeros more broadly as “God is impossible (or has no modal status)” and the “World is impossible (or has no modal status).” To illustrate the difference between these interpretations consider the position of W. V. O. Quine. He would say that God does not exist, the world does exist, but the world has no modal status. This option cannot be represented as O.n, O.c, or as O.cn since each presupposes modal status for the world. Nor can it be represented as O.o without serious distortion, since Quine does not deny that the world exists. Another illustration of the problem is Robert Neville’s emphasis on apophatic theology. In Neville’s view, the necessary/contingent contrast is a product of God’s creative act; God cannot be characterized as either necessary or contingent, but only as indeterminate, at least prior to the act of creation. Hartshorne’s table, as presented here, finesses these issues by interpreting the zeros in a strictly formal fashion to mean “neither necessary nor contingent,” leaving open the possibility of further refinement.

Whatever one’s ultimate convictions about this particular topic, Hartshorne’s approach arguably represents an advance in metaphysical or philosophical theology since it provides a matrix that may well suggest missed possibilities in traditional or conventional ways of thinking about the topic. Furthermore, Hartshorne’s method can be extended: similar 16-fold matrixes can be made for other polar contrasts such as infinite/finite, eternal/temporal, and so on. If any two matrixes are combined (16 X 16) the number of formal alternatives leaps to 256. More generally, if m equals the number of contrasts one wishes to include in talking about God and the world, then 16^m is the number of formal alternatives available. There is no apparent antecedent in the history of philosophical theology of Hartshorne’s matrices. It is no wonder, therefore, that he considered them as one of his original contributions to metaphysics.

3. Neoclassical Metaphysics

Hartshorne referred to his metaphysics as “neoclassical” to emphasize its continuity with classical traditions, especially as they sprang up in antiquity from the Presocratic philosophers and from Plato and Aristotle. He was also keen to stress that his views are importantly different, or new (“neo”), in their substantive claims. He would eventually highlight the parallels of his metaphysics with ideas in early Buddhist thought. The family of metaphysical views to which Hartshorne’s ideas belong is often called process philosophy or, following Bernard Loomer, process-relational philosophy. One finds anticipations of process-relational philosophy in Peirce’s tychism, James’s pluralistic universe, and Bergson’s la durée. Hartshorne was influenced by these philosophers (with Peirce being the most dominant of the three) but his greatest debt was to Whitehead.

a. Creativity

Philosophers venture various hypotheses as to the character of the finally real constituents of existence. One remembers Parmenides’ Being, Democritus’ tiny impenetrable atoms, Aristotle’s hylomorphic ousia, Descartes’ dual substance ontology, Leibniz’s monads, and Whitehead’s actual entities. Hartshorne adopted a Whiteheadian view, sometimes speaking of “dynamic singulars” instead of “actual entities.” Dynamic singulars are instances of what Hartshorne called “creative experiencing,” an expression that suggests an activity of synthesis, a bringing together of diverse elements from an entity’s antecedent world into a unity of feeling. Hartshorne often used Whitehead’s word “prehension” to name the feelings from which a dynamic singular weaves its own experience from the welter of data from its past. The “diverse elements” from the past that are synthesized are themselves instances of creative experiencing; for this reason, Hartshorne was fond of the expression “feeling of feeling,” which is close to Whitehead’s language in Process and Reality (Ch. X, sec. II). The prime example on which both Whitehead and Hartshorne model this activity is memory. Memories are themselves experiences that may have previous experiences as component parts. Moreover, memories are active in the way that they highlight some items of experience but place other items in the background, sometimes almost forgotten. Memory also serves as a model of the way emotional tone suffuses experience, in accordance with Hartshorne’s theory of the affective continuum. Finally, in keeping with process-relational philosophy, memory is a process, a coming-to-be, and not an unchanging substance; its very existence, moreover, depends upon its relation to past events.

Hartshorne agreed with Whitehead when the latter spoke of creativity as “the category of the ultimate.” In Whitehead’s words, “the many become one and are increased by one” (Process and Reality, Ch. II, sec. II). For both Whitehead and Hartshorne, creativity is not itself a substance but rather the name for the activity that characterizes every concrete particular, from the lowliest puff of existence to God. Thomas Aquinas restricted creativity in the strict sense to deity alone. Whitehead and Hartshorne, on the other hand, treat creativity as what medieval thinkers called a transcendental, a universal concept that is not restricted to this or that kind of real thing but which identifies a thing as such as real. Another departure from traditional ideas about creativity is that, for Whitehead and Hartshorne, creativity is never from nothing (ex nihilo), whether it is God’s creativity or the creativity of individuals within the cosmos. According to Hartshorne, the “nothing” in the expression “creatio ex nihilo” would be a purely negative fact. As noted in a previous section, Hartshorne rejects the existence of such facts. Thus, Hartshorne concluded that a creative act always presupposes an antecedent world from which the novel act arises.

Hartshorne’s emphasis on creativity illustrates his commitment to the principle—summarized in the previous section—that that which comes-to-be (becoming) includes but is not included by that which is but does not come to be (being). Hartshorne insists on taking “becoming” in the strictest sense as a process that adds to the definiteness of reality something that was not included in the class of real things prior to the act of becoming. Nothing corresponds to the word “reality” considered as a single nontemporal or eternal fact; rather, reality grows with every act of becoming and is, as it were, defined by them. Hartshorne rejects the idea that there is literally “nothing new under the sun”; on the contrary, there was a time when even the sun was new. Hartshorne is not simply reaffirming the flux of Heraclitus where all concrete things change; he is affirming that reality is a growing totality, an idea that is also prominent in Peirce’s evolutionary cosmology. The growth of reality, moreover, is thoroughly temporal—time itself is the process of creation. The past is determinate, the future is a field of relatively indeterminate possibilia, and the present is the process of determination. Finally, Hartshorne argues that what comes to be, once it has become fully determinate, is a permanent fixture of all subsequent becoming, guaranteed in the final analysis by God’s memory of it. This is why Hartshorne speaks of creation as a cumulative process.

b. Psychicalism

The fact that, for Hartshorne, experience is ontologically foundational means that his metaphysics is a type of what has traditionally been known as panpsychism. Early in his career, Hartshorne used “panpsychism,” distinguishing true and false versions of the doctrine. Later he preferred “psychicalism” and he said that he did not object to David Ray Griffin’s word “panexperientialism.” Hartshorne attributed mind-like qualities to every concrete particular (that is, dynamic singular), but his metaphysics cannot be described as anthropomorphic. He accepted Leibniz’s two-fold criticism of Descartes that self-consciousness is not the only form of human experience, and that human experience is not the only form of experience. In his second book, Beyond Humanism, Hartshorne points out that a dog need not become a human in order to suffer. In keeping with the theory of the affective continuum Hartshorne conceives mind-like qualities as existing along a continuum from the simplest feelings to the most complex thoughts. He argues that it is precisely in its psychological characteristics that it is possible for a nonhuman being to be infinitely other than a human being. This is because psychological variables such as memory, feeling, and volition are infinitely variable. Memories are conceivably of any span (a few seconds, a million years, and so forth) and of any condition of vagueness or precision; feelings can be any degree of intensity or complexity; volitions, which presuppose memory and feeling, are likewise infinitely variable.

Hartshorne denied the assumption of much of modern philosophy that an experience can have only itself as an object. The errors of waking experience as well as the false impressions during dreams provide no sure ground for a global skepticism—in the words of Peirce, “as if doubting were as easy as lying.” Hartshorne maintains that the question “What if all of our experience is a dream?” is based on a faulty phenomenology of dreaming and he points to Henri Bergson’s small book, Le rêve. Bergson argued that, during dreams, perceptions are indistinct, memory is free-floating, and attention is mostly disengaged, but the connection with the world through the body is never severed. Events and concerns of the day as well as immediate stimuli from the environment regularly appear in our dreams. Hartshorne gives the example of having dreamed of a propeller airplane and, as he awoke, hearing the sound of the airplane blend imperceptibly into the sound of a fan blowing in the room. As perception is not lacking in dreams, so more generally experience is always of something not itself. What philosophers call “the given” in experience are, according to Hartshorne, the independent causal conditions of the experience. Introspection too conforms to this model: it is a present experience having the immediately previous experience as an object. Experience, at every level imaginable, is essentially social—dynamic singulars feeling the feelings of others.

Hartshorne rejects the assumption that minds are essentially non-physical entities. Even Descartes, who argued for this claim, acknowledged that certain mental qualities are experienced as spread throughout one’s body or as being in specific regions of the body. Mental and physical qualities are indeed distinguishable but it does not follow that they are separable. Descartes raised the question of the criteria for the presence of mind in a physical object, thereby making materialism the default position for anything outside one’s own consciousness; since, however, mind-like qualities are so pervasively present in varying degrees in so much of nature, Hartshorne asked for the criteria for the absence of mind. The problem, as Hartshorne sees it, is as much with the concept of mind as with the concept of the physical or of matter. He raises the question whether there is anything that positively corresponds to the concept of a merely physical entity, that is to say, a physical entity in which mind-like qualities—not simply human mind-like qualities—are wholly absent. To be sure, there are physical entities in which mind seems to be absent, but Hartshorne argues that this is no more evidence of the absence of mind than the appearance of inactivity in a physical object is evidence that there is no activity in it. Leibniz guessed otherwise and modern science is on his side; the micro-world, even where apparently “dead matter” is concerned, is buzzing with activity. The old adage, “absence of evidence is not evidence of absence” applies.

In arguing for the ubiquity of mind-like qualities, Hartshorne found inspiration in certain aspects of Leibniz’s panpsychism. With Leibniz, he distinguished parts and wholes. The parts—Hartshorne’s dynamic singulars—have mind-like qualities even if some wholes of which they are made lack them. He argues by analogy that feeling can be everywhere even though not everything feels. For instance, a flock of birds does not have feeling, but there are feelings in the individual birds. Hartshorne explains the difference using a modified version of Leibniz’s concept of a “dominant entelechy” according to which some physical systems are organized in such a way that the experiences of the dynamic singulars (the parts) can be channeled into a single more or less unified stream of experience or even conscious experience, as in the case of animals with complex nervous systems. In Hartshorne’s theory, the body not only reacts to the world around it, but also reacts to itself. We feel the feelings of at least some of our cells. As Hartshorne said, hurt my cells and you hurt me. Some organic wholes, such as plants, do not have a structure integrated enough to allow for a dominant stream of experience. Hartshorne viewed plants as having no feeling, but he attributed feelings to their individual cells. He held that the phototropism of a flower tracking the sun is more a function of the activity of the cells than of the plant as a whole. Hartshorne generalizes this analysis along Leibnizian lines to the inorganic world. Leibniz spoke of monads in inorganic substances as being in a “stupor.” Hartshorne attains a similar result in his theory of the infinite variability of mind-like qualities. There is no such thing as “mere matter,” only matter in which mind-like qualities are far removed from what is recognizably human-like, animal-like, or even cell-like. With Leibniz’s distinctions, Hartshorne is able to theorize that there is experience in every object, but not every object of experience is an experiencing object.

Despite Hartshorne’s use of Leibniz’s ideas, the dissimilarities between their versions of panpsychism are as striking as their similarities. As already noted, dynamic singulars are entities that come to exist in the creative-cumulative advance of the world; Leibniz’s monads do not come to exist within the universe but are coexistent with it. For Leibniz, God’s creation of the universe is nothing more than God’s creation of the monads that make it up. Another significant difference between the two philosophers concerns relations of cause and effect. Leibniz denied causal relations among nondivine monads—they are “sans fenêtres” (windowless); he secured the appearance of relations of cause and effect by positing a divinely imposed pre-established harmony. For Hartshorne, every dynamic singular is both a partial result of causal conditions that precede it and a partial causal condition of events that succeed it. In short, every dynamic singular is both an effect and a cause. The word “partial,” especially as regards the relation from cause to effect, is important. Hartshorne rejected determinism (see below), and this represents another departure from Leibniz. For Hartshorne, causal conditions are necessary, but not entirely sufficient, for the emergence of a dynamic singular. The individual’s response to its own causal past—the way it synthesizes the world given to it—provides an ineradicable aspect of the explanation for why it is the way it is. It acts and is not merely acted upon. According to Hartshorne, the same principle applies to God, although allowance must be made in the divine case for the modal difference between existence and actuality (see below). The twin ideas that there are real relations among dynamic singulars and that each is unique by virtue of its manner of experiencing the world highlight two features of Hartshorne’s metaphysics. First, reality has a social structure (see below, under “personal identity” for a discussion of the meaning of “social”); second, every concrete particular that “makes” the world retains at least a minimal degree of freedom.

One objection to Hartshorne’s theory is that mental qualities seem to require a central nervous system. In Beyond Humanism, Hartshorne makes several points that are crucially relevant to this objection. He notes that among animals with central nervous systems, physical and psychical qualities are correlated. Hartshorne observes, in an almost Teilhardian turn of phrase, that physical complexity is a sign of psychical complexity. The more complex is the mental life, the more complex is the nervous system that underlies it. Can one generalize beyond creatures with a nervous system? Hartshorne points out that one-celled animals manage the functions of digestion, oxygenation, and locomotion without the organs and body parts that in creatures with nervous systems make these possible. He asks whether mental function, broadly conceived, may not be analogous. Is it any more reasonable to say that a paramecium feels nothing because it lacks a central nervous system than it is to say that it cannot swim because it has neither motor nerves nor muscle cells? If it has primitive feelings, then it displays them behaviorally in the only way it could, by responding to stimuli. Hartshorne argues that the only conclusion that can be drawn from physiology is that similarity of mind between a one-celled creature and a human is limited by the dissimilarity of their bodies. Physical wholes insufficiently organized to allow a dominant stream of experience are the closest thing in Hartshorne’s philosophy to what materialists call “matter.”

An important objection to Hartshorne’s psychicalist theory is suggested in the work of Karl Popper. In his classic treatise on the mind-body problem titled The Self and Its Brain (co-authored with neuroscientist John Eccles), Popper objected to “psychicalist” or “proto-mental” conceptions of the brain’s elementary particles, arguing that such conceptions have no empirical explanatory power and are thus “metaphysical in the bad sense.” Popper maintains that elementary particles can have no “interior states” because they are “completely identical whatever their past states.” For example, any arbitrary proton selected at any time for measurement will have the same physical properties as any other proton selected at any time for measurement: its mass will be 938 MeV/c²; its charge +1; and its spin ½.

Contra Popper, it does not follow from this that elementary particles are absolutely, predicatively identical no matter what their past states. To use Hartshorne’s dipolar vocabulary, Popper is here conflating “gen-identity” (identical characteristics over time) and “strict identity.” Such properties as mass, charge and spin are gen-identical features of protons that are present in each proton-occasion. However, protons do not remain static in terms of their empirically discernible behavior over periods of time. For example, a proton P in a tritium nucleus of hydrogen (a nucleus of hydrogen with one proton and two neutrons) has a rate of radiation decay as compared to a distinctive proton P* in a lead-206 nucleus (one of the four “stable” isotopes of lead), which has no such decay, as is now familiar to us through the “half-life radiation law.” Notice that the behavioral differences occur precisely because of differences in physical contexts. That physical context matters to the behavior of protons is readily explicable in a Hartshornean interpretation of elementary particle-occasions, because such particle-occasions are “open” to their environments—in Whitehead’s vocabulary, the environments are their “actual worlds”—through prehension. More recent empirically well-corroborated developments in quantum physics are likewise readily explicable in Hartshorne’s psychicalist interpretation, again through the notion of prehension. One may note in this regard the phenomena that (a) “information transfer or influence” occurs between well-separated particles faster than light-cone propagation (that is, quantum entanglement) and (b) that physical states are discernibly influenced by the selection and rapidity of an observation or measurement process (that is, quantum Zeno effect). It may well be no accident that one of the first philosopher-physicists to devise experimental tests for quantum entanglement phenomena was Abner Shimony, a student of Hartshorne’s at the University of Chicago, who has remained indebted to the “Whiteheadian paradigm.” In neuroscience, the emergence of neuroplastic phenomena in which rigorously repeated thought or “attentional” exercises have an empirically discernible effect upon brain metabolism as shown through PET-scans also conjures a top-down causation model which again can be readily handled by a Hartshornean interpretation of particle-occasions as prehensive. Thus, Popper’s dismissive estimate of the empirical explanatory power of psychicalist or panexperientialist concepts seems to be, at the very least, seriously challenged by more recent developments in physics.

Hartshorne believed that his concept of the infinite variability of mind-like qualities provides the theoretical bridge to extend the categories of experience beyond the human, the animal, or even the organic. He does not deny that these speculations about the possibility of radically non-human or non-animal minds are, for the foreseeable future, of little or no use to much of science. Physics, for example, need not worry whether atoms or electrons have “feelings”; but this may simply be a way of saying that what is of interest to metaphysics is not necessarily of interest to physics. In a 1934 article in The New Frontier, Hartshorne characterized physics as the behavioristic aspect of the lowest branch of comparative psychology, or even of comparative sociology since reality, in his view, has a social structure. Hartshorne argued further that psychicalism is the metaphysic best suited to an evolutionary world-view. Psychicalism does not face the problem of the emergence of mind from what is wholly lacking in psychical qualities. Hartshorne calls this view “temporal dualism”; all of the problems of mind-body dualism of how to relate nonphysical mind to nonmental matter are repeated, only in an evolutionary context. For Hartshorne, on the contrary, new forms of mind emerge in the process of evolution, but not mind itself.

c. Indeterminism and Freedom

The philosophy of creative becoming is inherently anti-deterministic. This is not to say that Hartshorne denied relations of cause and effect or that he rejected the laws of nature discovered through scientific investigation. It is all-too-common for philosophers to argue that the falsity of determinism implies chaoticism, the doctrine that there exists, at most, an appearance of causal regularity in the world. By way of clarification, Hartshorne noted that determinism posits absolute modal regularity in the sense that, for every set of causal conditions, it is not only the case that, then and there, there is only one effect that will occur (which may well be a truism), but there is only one effect, then and there, that can occur (note that “can” is a modal concept). As William James argued in “The Dilemma of Determinism,” if some sets of causal conditions allow for more than one possible effect, then determinism is false. Therefore, the logical contradictory of absolute regularity is non-absolute regularity, not absolute irregularity (chaoticism). Absolute irregularity is the logical contrary, not the contradictory, of determinism. For this reason, Hartshorne argues in Wisdom as Moderation that determinism and chaoticism are the extreme metaphysical positions, both of which may be false. If both are false, then some form of indeterminism must be true.

Determinism has sometimes gone by the name of the doctrine of necessity, as in Perice’s famous article “The Doctrine of Necessity Examined.” The meaning of “necessity” as it applies to determinism is that a specific effect could not have been otherwise given the causes that brought it about; in other words, causes necessitate their effects. Indeed, determinists seek to minimize the extent to which events seem contingent—that they could have been otherwise—by uncovering their causal antecedents. The deterministic theory is that all contingency in the world, which is to say, all of the variety and novelty or all deviations from absolute regularity, are apparent only. Alternate effects seem possible, but determinists claim that this is only because of our ignorance of all of the factors—the causes and the laws that link cause to effect—that explain a particular effect. Nevertheless, hidden within the seeming contingency of our ignorance is another necessity: the causal nexus of events absolutely fixes the details of our knowledge in any given situation. Of course, whether determinism or indeterminism is correct, some degree of ignorance and fallibility is an inescapable aspect of the human condition. The indeterminism espoused by Hartshorne also admits of unknown causes that limit what is possible. For example, an athlete may eat breakfast with plans of competing later in the day, not realizing that the food she is eating is contaminated and will incapacitate her. In Hartshorne’s theory, however, contingency is not merely a function of ignorance; on the contrary, sometimes there are real alternatives, no one of which the concatenation of causal conditions entirely eliminates. The incapacitated athlete, for example, may nevertheless have a variety of real alternatives for how to respond to the food poisoning.

Peirce argued, and Hartshorne agreed with him, that one cannot help but posit real alternatives: either reality as a whole could have been otherwise or contingency enters the world piecemeal or incrementally. Determinists may attempt to eliminate contingency within the universe by tracing events to their causal antecedents—to a singularity at the beginning of the universe or to an eternal decree from deity—but there remains the question of why the universe has the exact initial conditions that it has. There is no plausible modal theory that would allow one to consider the contingency of the initial conditions as a hidden form of necessity. Thus, contingency is unavoidable, or as Hartshorne says in Creative Synthesis (Ch. II), “There can be no alternative to alternativeness itself.” Hartshorne, following Peirce and James, locates the contingency of the universe not in an absolute beginning or in the divine will but within the universe’s own creative processes—in Hartshorne’s words, contingency “seeping into the world bit by bit” (Creativity in American Philosophy, Ch. X). James spoke of “pluralism’s additive world” and this is Hartshorne’s view: the coming-to-be of each dynamic singular introduces a morsel of novelty into existence and, in so doing, adds itself to the universe. Every subsequent dynamic singular must take account of this prior addition to the universe as a causal factor in its own emergence. In this way, there is a rhythm of the universe as each new subject of experience inevitably becomes a new object for a new experience.

It should now be clear that Hartshorne intended his version of indeterminism to leave ample room for the massive regularities—the order—of the world that scientists make it their business to discover, but these regularities are not absolute as determinists conceive them to be. Hartshorne turned on its head the traditional doctrine that effects are contained in their causes; for Hartshorne, it is the other way around: at the most basic metaphysical level of analysis, causes are contained in their effects. Again, Hartshorne finds a clue in the experience of memory. One’s memory-of-X includes X as an indispensable causal component, but X as partial cause of one’s memory-of-X does not contain the memory itself. Hartshorne goes further and denies that memory-of-X is contained, implicitly or virtually, in the entire set of causal conditions leading up to the memory. In short, the causal antecedents of the memory provide the necessary but not the sufficient conditions of the memory. The present memory-experience is an instance of creative experiencing; as such, it adds a novel element to reality. Nevertheless, the causal conditions are limiting factors in what experience may result from them; the causes define a field of possible experience activity. Not just any effect can result from a particular set of casual conditions and this principle is enough to block the inference from indeterminism to chaoticism. This principle also provides the metaphysical ground of developmental processes. For example, every adult human has a developmental history beginning with a fertilized egg, but no single-celled zygote and its genetic make-up is sufficient to make an adult. The countless intermediate steps of growth and education, as well as the person’s own reactions to his or her circumstances, are required to complete the process.

Since at least David Hume, philosophers have acknowledged that empirical science cannot establish the truth of determinism. There remained, however, the idea that scientific explanations presuppose or require a deterministic framework. In Hartshorne’s reckoning, Peirce disposed of this claim once and for all. First, Peirce observed that measurements can be no more fine-grained than our instruments and our proneness to error will allow. There can be no empirical or scientific meaning to the concept of an absolute measurement. Second, the far reaching regularities in nature that a reasonable indeterminism posits are enough for the purposes of scientific theorizing; saying that the regularities are absolute, as determinism does, adds nothing. The much diminished levels of novel experiencing that Hartshorne’s metaphysics locates in the world of inorganic beings makes that realm as deterministic in appearance as it needs to be for the purposes of discovering laws of nature. To be sure, those laws must be understood as stochastic, but this fits well enough with scientific judgments which are couched in terms of probabilities rather than certainties. It is worth noting that Hartshorne did not look to subatomic physics for his main support for indeterminism, for he believed that the case against determinism had already been made by Peirce and others. As far as Hartshorne was concerned, quantum indeterminacies buttress the case against determinism by showing that physics, the supposedly most materialistic of sciences, does not require determinism. Even Einstein, who rejected indeterministic interpretations of quantum phenomena, did not deny that those interpretations were scientific.

Numerous philosophers use moral freedom as an argument—perhaps the central argument—against determinism. Hartshorne agreed that moral freedom is indispensable to a proper understanding of human life but he was more interested in defending a more generalized idea of freedom that extends beyond moral decision-making and even into the nonhuman realm. Freedom in this more generalized sense, as a creative act, complements and completes Hartshorne’s indeterminism. In The Logic of Perfection (Ch. VIII), he speaks of causality as crystallized freedom and freedom as causality in the making. As we have just seen, for Hartshorne, every effect is more than, and even includes, the causal conditions that make it possible. If one analyzes the effect, abstracting from its causes, one is left with the particular way in which a dynamic singular experiences its causal antecedents, which is the measure of novelty in it. The word “experience” may call to mind a merely private epiphenomenon, but Hartshorne insists that experience has an ineliminable public aspect as it becomes a datum for subsequent experiences—a cause for future effects. In Creative Experiencing: A Philosophy of Freedom, he stresses that this idea of freedom is essentially social. Every creative act is a combination of self-determination and determination by others. The creative act, once completed in a dynamic singular, becomes part-cause of subsequent dynamic singulars. In this way, cause and effect relations are explained by the more basic principle of freedom limiting freedom.

For all of Hartshorne’s animadversions on determinism and his advocacy of a philosophy of creativity, he was under no illusions about the limits, sometimes extreme limits, on freedom in any particular situation. In The Logic of Perfection (Ch. VIII), he speaks of a present creation as adding “only its little mite” to the vast totality of the universe. Hartshorne says that a phrase like “creative experiencing” escapes redundancy because there are degrees of creativity. As Hartshorne’s indeterminism provides the metaphysical ground for developmental ideas, so the concept of freedom limiting freedom provides the ground for a meaningful concept of degrees of freedom. Freedom increases to the extent that there are more options of more complexity, allowing for greater contrasts of feeling. The development of more and more complex organisms during the course of evolution makes for new levels of organizational structure (for example, in the convolutions of brains), more varieties of experiencing, and a widening range of possibilities for creative realization. The most dramatic example of augmented freedom occurs when organisms cross the threshold from experience to conscious experience. This occurred in the evolution of the human species but it is also the natural development within each member of that species. Hartshorne remarks on how the complexities of a symphony can be appreciated by a human being but they are hopelessly beyond the understanding of creatures with simpler brains. Consciousness also makes possible moral freedom which brings with it increased opportunities for achievement and for risk of failure in the attainment of high ideals. The opportunities and the risks go hand-in-hand in such a way that one cannot be had without the other.

d. Personal Identity

The attribution of responsibility for acts worthy of praise or censure involves the concept of a person, or more fundamentally, of agency. With the problematic exception of a supernatural deity that exists outside of time, persons do not simply exist, they persist; their existence requires days, months, and years. Dynamic singulars, as momentary flashes of experience, are not persons, but in Hartshorne’s view, they are the raw materials from which persons are made. One can say that a person is a whole of which dynamic singulars are the parts. Hartshorne adopts the more refined categories of Whitehead’s philosophy in order to express, in neoclassical terms, the concept of personhood. Whitehead spoke of a nexus as any “particular fact of togetherness among actual entities.” A society is a type of nexus whose constituents prehend (feel) a common element of form. Every mammal, for example, is a society of dynamic singulars, each of which inherits from its predecessors and passes along to its successors the form of “mammal.” A society is more than a mere mathematical set, for the common form of the society is passed along—shared by prehensive relations—from one grouping of dynamic singulars to another.

In the philosophies of Whitehead and Hartshorne, the existence of a person requires that there be a special type of society, one that exhibits personal order. A personally ordered society is a sequence of dynamic singulars, no two of which are contemporaries. This is the neoclassical metaphysical account of our sense of being persons that persist through time. Both Whitehead and Hartshorne emphasize, however, that personally ordered societies are embodied. A personally ordered society is a sub-society within the larger society that is the human body. Leibniz spoke of a dominant entelechy or soul associated with each animal body, itself a collection of monads; a personally ordered society is a very rough equivalent of this (taking into account all of the caveats mentioned in the discussion of psychicalism). Each dynamic singular making up a personally ordered society inherits not only from its predecessor in the sequence but also from the dynamic singulars that make up the rest of the body. The body, one might say, is the immediate environment of the soul, or more colloquially, the self. Whitehead and Hartshorne believed that a personally ordered society does not survive without the body. Although neither philosopher definitively dismissed the possibility of a limited post-mortem existence, they did not show the slightest interest in speculating on the details of such a possibility.

Hartshorne argued that his and Whitehead’s view of personhood avoids two extremes. A person is not, as Hume seemed to think, a mere bundle of qualities existing from moment to moment, with no internal relations among its component parts. Every dynamic singular within a personally ordered society is a creative appropriation of its successors in the sequence and in the wider environment of its body. As noted in the previous section, Hartshorne denied determinism without denying the efficacy of causal regularities. Certain kinds of damage to the brain, for instance, are real causal factors in seriously altering or even eliminating personality. The other extreme that Hartshorne claims to avoid is the denial of external relations among the components of the self. According to Leibniz, the identity of a monad, including a dominant entelechy, is in its “concept,” which is all of the properties that ever were or will be true of it. Hartshorne maintains that a person is a product of developmental processes that are inherently open-ended, allowing for different outcomes. For this reason, Hartshorne accepted the Jamesian view that one’s character as so far formed is no absolute guarantee of one’s future behavior. It is true, as is said, that people “act in character,” but one is also part-creator of one’s character. We meet here once again, but now as applied to the problem of self-identity, the protean nature of creativity in neoclassical metaphysics. As each dynamic singular in one’s personally ordered society emerges, one is a partly new self.

On Hartshorne’s principles, personal identity is not a matter of strict or mathematical identity. The additive nature of creativity entails that identity through time, or gen-identity, is relative only—a question of “more or less” rather than “all or none.” The unity of self-identity in a person is wholly a function of the inertia that past dynamic singulars carry into the present of a personally ordered series. Hartshorne sometimes spoke of this relation as being among past and present “selves.” James said that the present thought itself is the thinker. Hartshorne would agree, for it is not the past “selves” in a personal sequence that do the thinking; the present is where thinking occurs and where particular decisions are made. For most of us, most of the time, the broad outlines of our personality remain stable, allowing us to speak of ourselves as being “the same person.” Yet, dramatic changes are possible, for the better and for the worse. The annals of both brain science and of religious conversion are full of case histories of persons who undergo changes that are sufficiently global to speak of a new person being born. It is also worth noting that Hartshorne’s metaphysics allows for the possibility that a single body could support more than one personally ordered society; this might provide the outlines of an account of multiple personality or even of aspects of the unconscious mind.

Hartshorne’s theory of personal identity is not reductionist. It is, like his indeterminism and philosophy of freedom, inherently developmental. Consider the beginnings of a human life. In most cases, conception results in a full complement of chromosomes necessary for a human person to develop. Much more must be accomplished, even within the mother’s reproductive system, to complete the process. The single-celled zygote from which we grow is genetically human, but it is arguably not the individual we associate with being a person. For example, far from being one individual rather than another, the fertilized egg has the potential to divide to produce twins or triplets. Hartshorne noted that his twin brothers, James and Henry, were very different persons despite having the same genetic make-up. Another argument against reducing personhood to genetic structure is that the nervous system and a functioning brain, which provide the physiological basis of human personhood, are not present from the moment of conception; they are the result of development both in utero and after birth. These observations do not determine the moral or legal status of the unborn, but they are relevant to those questions, for they argue against reducing personhood to genetics. To be sure, the question of abortion is complicated. When does the unborn become a person with rights and how do these rights, assuming they exist, stand vis-à-vis a woman’s manifest right to self-determination? Hartshorne was firmly on the side of allowing women to decide for themselves, apart from interference from government or religion, whether to terminate an unwanted pregnancy. His position on abortion was basically that of Roe v. Wade. What Hartshorne’s metaphysic of personal identity brings to the debate is a robust rejection of reducing personhood to genetics and a corresponding emphasis on developmental categories. In The Second Sex, Simone de Beauvoir wrote that one is not born a woman, but becomes one. Hartshorne would agree and generalize the thought: one is not born a person, but becomes a person.

Hartshorne drew interesting ethical implications from his metaphysics of personal identity. Most notably, he argued that a metaphysics which includes such Whiteheadian notions as prehension, personally-ordered societies of actual occasions, and transmutation of conformal feeling, could never countenance what Hartshorne calls the “illusions of egoism.” Even more plausible versions of “enlightened” ethical egoism, which allow interest in others for the sake of welfare of self, are incoherent in Hartshorne’s reckoning. Enlightened self-interest theories are based on a partially true but misleading “common sense” conception of self-identity that fails to grasp the logical distinction between being an individual and being the concrete states of an individual. The former is an abstraction from the latter. No momentary state is strictly identical with any other but there can be enough continuity to speak of an abstract, relatively unchanging, character. As Hartshorne says in The Zero Fallacy (Ch. XII), “The identity is somewhat abstract, the non-identity is concrete. Without this distinction the language of self-identity is a conceptual trap.” When this distinction is grasped, we see that the claim to have an interest in self cannot be simpliciter or absolute, since there must always be an “other,” namely, the future concrete states of the individual self, to which the interests of the self in a concrete state now must be addressed. Moreover, the fact that (psychologically normal) individuals “enjoy the enjoyment of others” is grounded in the metaphysical structure of social selves, whose dominant occasions of experience are built up and transmuted by conformal feeling of the feeling-tone in constituent neural occasions. We are, quite literally in Hartshorne’s account, “members one of another.” That is to say, a “self” is precisely a creative synthesis of feelings of others through its “perceptual mode of causal efficacy” in Whitehead’s language. The capacity for feeling the feelings of others, in a word “sympathy,” is basic, and thus the capacity for altruism as well as selfishness is built into the nature of being a social organism.

e. Time and Possibility

Hartshorne’s philosophy of creative experiencing is inseparable from his philosophy of time. As already explained, he posits a universe that is forever in the making by the dynamic singulars that come to be. What has already been made is the past, what has yet to be made is the future, and the present is the locus of activity where future possibility becomes past actuality. This characterization of time is in one sense circular, for the definens presupposes the definiendum; for example, “yet to be” presupposes “future.” What keeps the definition from being vacuous is Hartshorne’s concept of creativity or making. Classical ideas about creation in Christian tradition, for example, place God outside of time as its creator. According to this theory, God brings the temporal world—past, present, future—into existence but the divine act itself is not in time. From God’s eternity, what is future for us is as fully detailed as any moment that has for us become past. Hartshorne, on the other hand, finds a fundamental asymmetry in temporal relations. There is no such thing, even from a divine perspective, of a future that is as fully detailed as the past. The future, as “yet to be made,” lacks details that will not exist until the making of them. The “making of them,” as already noted, adds something to the universe that was not previously part of it. The universe, and time itself, is nothing more than this process of accumulated and accumulating acts of becoming and all that they contain.

Some commentators are tempted to see in Hartshorne’s theory of time a variation on J. M. E. McTaggart’s concept of an A-series. However, in his article on “Time” for Vergilius Ferm’s 1955 Encyclopedia of Religion, Hartshorne distinguished his own ideas from those of McTaggart. McTaggart distinguished two ways of marking time: the A-series of relations of past, present, and future and the B-series of relations of before and after. McTaggart said that if one abstracts from the A-series and B-series relations, one is left with an ordered array of events, called a C-series, without temporal order of any kind. If a C-series is like a film strip, with each frame representing an event, the A-series is analogous to frames passing in front of the light of the projector; as the light shines through a particular frame the photo on that frame is a present event, beforehand it is a future event and afterwards it is a past event. By contrast, Hartshorne’s cumulative theory of becoming entails that there is no such thing as a C-series from which A-series relations could be abstracted. To continue the analogy, there is no film running on a projector with frames yet to be viewed. In short, there are no future events. At best, and in keeping with Hartshorne’s indeterminism, there is field of possibility that is only as detailed as the past determines it must be, all else in the field remaining essentially vague, awaiting full determination as novel dynamic singulars arise in the creative advance. By parity of reasoning, B-series relations are not fixed in eternity but are themselves results of temporal becoming. For example, the fact denoted by “Socrates died before Aristotle’s birth” could not exist until Aristotle was born. This is no mere limitation of human knowledge. After Socrates’ death and before Aristotle’s birth, there was no such relation as Socrates-having-died-before-Aristotle-was-born; what existed at the time of Socrates’ death was a range of recently emergent possibilities of someone or other being born after Socrates, for example: a-great-philosopher-born-fifteen-years-after-the-death-of-Socrates. As Hartshorne says in the Encyclopedia article, “Time is not a mere relation of becomings but a becoming of relations.”

Hartshorne grounded modal concepts in the temporal structure of the world. He often quoted, with approval, Peirce’s dictum that time is a particular variety of objective modality: the past is fully determinate or actual, the future is relatively indeterminate or possible, and the present is the becoming of the actual as the relatively indeterminate becomes determinate. Following the lead of both Peirce and James, Hartshorne argued that determinism denies the reality of time. As noted previously, the only objective modality where determinism is concerned is necessity. Hartshorne’s indeterminism, on the other hand, posits necessity in the direction from effect to cause; in the direction from cause to effect, however, there is an element of contingency, and this is the objective modality of the future. Determinists emphasize our ignorance of causes and the consequent inability to clearly perceive the necessary relations among all events. For the determinist, however, the ignorance includes the systematic illusion of time’s direction. From a practical point of view we cannot help but treat the illusion as reality. Aristotle remarked in Nichomachean Ethics (Bk. VI) that no one decides to have sacked Troy; however, the war (assuming its historicity) was once a matter of urgent decision in which the future was not something to be known but something to be made. For this reason, Hartshorne maintained that we act as though the future is relatively indeterminate even if we convince ourselves otherwise.

Hartshorne argued that the human capacity to form general conceptions and to frame principles that guide actions is another illustration that it is necessarily the case that we act as though determinism were false and time is real. The asymmetry between remembering a past event and planning for a future event is a powerful indication of the asymmetry of time. One may remember or misremember any amount of detail about a plan that has been carried out, but when the plan has yet to be executed, the only details that can be known are ones within the plan itself. As a script for future activity, the plan is abstract compared to its eventual realization. One may remember having taken one’s dog for a walk, including the memory of having intended to take a particular route; however, the memory of the originally intended route cannot include everything that happened on the walk: on this walk, a toddler peered at you from beside a car, a fallen branch blocked your path, you stepped on two ants, a street lamp burned out, a raccoon scurried into a sewage drain—these and countless other details were not included in the plan. Of course, what one anticipates by way of plans, intentions, or purposes, can be more or less specific. Regardless of the amount of detail, however, one’s future projects leave innumerable particulars undecided. When things go “as planned” it is not because every aspect of the plan matched some detail fixed in advance, for there are many ways that plans can be successfully fulfilled. Musicians know that every musical score leaves a great deal to be decided; different performances can be equally faithful to what the composer wrote.

Hartshorne realized that if his theory of modality as essentially temporal is correct then there can be no such thing as merely possible worlds that are not anchored in the actual world. At most, there are possible world-states; that is to say, there are ways the actual world might have been. For any given past event, there was a time when something else might have occurred in its place. We can ask “What if?” about the past in order to conceive of ways the world might have been different, even though nothing can now be done to change what occurred. The future, on the other hand, is the arena of what might yet occur given the actual history of the world up to the present. Hartshorne’s view contrasts neatly with Leibniz’s idea that possible worlds are completely detailed descriptions of universes that God might choose to create. Possible worlds, in the Leibnizian sense, contain possible persons. As Leibniz argues in his correspondence with Arnauld, when the “concept”—the complete description of a possible person—is made actual by God, the person exists; the making actual of a different “concept” (that is, altering the description in some way) would result in a different person. Hartshorne objects that persons cannot be merely possible. Contrary to Leibniz, an actual person could have had properties other than what it has and the properties that it has could have been had by others. For example, Hillary Clinton could have been elected the U.S. president in 2008 and someone besides Hillary could have been Bill Clinton’s first lady. A fictional character, on the other hand, has no reality beyond the description of it; it has enough specificity to simulate a real person, but no feat of magic could transform it into a real person. Hartshorne’s arguments clearly anticipate and dovetail with those of Saul Kripke in Naming and Necessity. Kripke maintains that a proper name designates the same object across possible worlds (for example, Hillary Clinton) whereas a description designates different objects from world to world (for example, “winner of the 2008 U.S. presidential election”). Kripke also suggested that “counter-factual situation” or “possible state (or history) of the world” are less misleading expressions than “possible world.” To speak of a “counter-factual” is to presuppose the factual. On these points, Hartshorne and Kripke are in full agreement.

On the question of the nature of possibility, Hartshorne sided closely with Peirce but parted ways with Whitehead. Peirce conceived the realm of possibilities as a continuum which, by definition, has no least member, but is infinitely divisible. There are no actual parts of a continuum, only an infinite number of ways to slice it. This idea is evident in Hartshorne’s concept of the affective continuum (see the companion article “Charles Hartshorne: Biography/Philosophy: Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation”). Whitehead, on the other hand, spoke of “eternal objects” as “forms of definiteness” that identify what a thing is. The point of calling eternal objects “eternal” is that none of them are novel; the point of calling them “objects” is that they are definite; for example, a particular shade of green is this shade and no other. To use Whitehead’s example, a leaf on a tree changes colors but any particular shade of color exhibited by the leaf does not change. Hartshorne maintains, by contrast, that the shades of color in question are neither eternal nor are they definite objects; put somewhat differently, they are definite only insofar as they are not eternal. The successive shades of color of the leaf are slices of the color continuum that exist as definite only when instantiated in the leaf. The color of the leaf at a particular moment is novel. In Hartshorne’s account, we speak of sameness of color because the gradation between any two shades may be so infinitesimally slight as to be imperceptible. He noted that observed sameness of color is not a transitive relation. An object X may appear to be the same color as Y and Y the same color as Z, but X may appear slightly different than Z. In other words, there is a threshold defined by a degree of separation on the color continuum below which real differences are not observable for creatures like us.

According to Hartshorne, any quality that admits of a negative instance is not eternal. There are, in short, emergent universals. In Creative Synthesis (Ch. IV), Hartshorne notes that “lover of Shakespeare” is a universal in the sense that it may be true of more than one thing but it is emergent in the sense that it could be true of nothing prior to Shakespeare. By parity of reasoning, specific qualities in the affective continuum—particular tonal qualities, particular shades of color, and so forth—emerge as the affective continuum is cut in various ways and patterns by dynamic singulars. On the other hand, the generic quality of “feeling” may be classified, in Hartshornean principles, as eternal, if not quite an “object” in the Whiteheadian sense. As previously noted, qualities that admit only of positive instances are metaphysical. A consequence of Hartshorne’s view is that similarity is not simply a function of partial identity. It is true that we count two things similar when they have a sufficient number of qualities in common. But it is also the case that qualities themselves are similar to each other, as when we observe that orange is closer to red than it is to blue. Hartshorne concludes that similarity is as metaphysically ultimate as identity.

f. The Aesthetic Motif

One of the best and earliest interpreters of Hartshorne’s philosophy, Eugene Peters, spoke of “the aesthetic motif” that runs through neoclassical theism. Peters was drawing attention to the fact that, for Hartshorne, the most inclusive values are aesthetic. Hartshorne began his career proposing, as an empirical hypothesis, that all sensations are feelings and that all feelings exist along an aesthetic continuum (see “Charles Hartshorne: Philosophy and Psychology of Sensation”). Hartshorne’s metaphysics completes and complements the empirical hypothesis by considering the value-achievement and value-enrichment of dynamic singulars as the very foundations of existence. In Divine Beauty, Daniel Dombrowski rightly says that, for Hartshorne, aesthetic experiences are not merely woven into the real, they are the real. The poet e. e. cummings wrote, “Since feeling is first / who pays any attention / to the syntax of things . . .” Hartshorne did precisely what cummings dismissed (at least in the poem): he recognized feeling as first (that is, as a metaphysical category) but he also paid close attention to the syntax of things (to understand the structure of feeling).

In his first book Hartshorne rejected the “annex view of value.” In the context of neoclassical metaphysics this means that there is no merely valueless stuff (what Whitehead called “vacuous actuality”) onto which values are projected by human or divine purposes. Our pre-reflective experiences of our bodies, our memories, and of the world are never, Hartshorne insists, of bare valueless existence. The mother hears her baby’s cries as irritating and the mother’s songs are heard as soothing by the child. The values in experience, however, are not primarily ethical but aesthetic, a fact most clearly illustrated in the animal kingdom. The experiences of subhuman creatures are productive primarily—and for most creatures, exclusively—of non-moral values. When a lion fells an antelope, it is good for the lion pride and bad for the antelope, but moral judgments are out of place. One may, it is true, stress what is adaptive in behavior and useful for the survival of the species. There remain, however, the values of living for the lions and for the antelope that derive from being aware of the world around them, of breathing, eating, and the interactions with their fellows. These creatures do not think about their worlds but they feel them. For them, aesthesis or feeling (the root of “aesthetics”) is indeed “first.” Hartshorne’s extensive study of song birds in his book Born to Sing supports this hypothesis; oscines have what in us would be called an aesthetic sense.

Hartshorne did not consider beauty to be the only aesthetic value, but “beauty” was his word of choice for what anchors his aesthetic theory. One could generalize or gloss “beauty” to mean intense satisfactory experience without distorting Hartshorne’s meaning. Much of traditional aesthetics holds that beauty is unity within diversity. Hartshorne argued, however, that another contrast is necessary to make sense of beauty, that of complexity and simplicity. This concept of beauty, along with the relation of beauty to other aesthetic values, is expressed in the Dessoir-Davis-Hartshorne Circle. (Max Dessoir and Kay Davis helped Hartshorne with the diagram.) If Hartshorne is correct, then beauty is a mean between two extremes, between order and disorder on the one hand (the vertical axis of the circles) and between complexity and simplicity on the other (the horizontal axis of the circles). Outside of the boundary of the outer circle is not merely aesthetic failure but also the failure of experience and therefore (because of Hartshorne’s psychicalism) of existence itself.

For Hartshorne, beauty (or any aesthetic quality) is not merely in “the eye of the beholder” (or the perception of the perceiver). One must take into account not only the perceiving mind but what the mind perceives. A mind of sufficient complexity, cultivation, and education is required to appreciate the elements that make for beauty in something. For example, until one knows what counterpoint is and until one is taught to listen for it, one is not in a position to be fully aware of it and one may not even be able to hear it. An adequate grasp of such things is beyond the ability of creatures with simpler nervous systems or of humans with certain kinds of brain damage. There is, in short, an intellectual component of beauty that requires a higher intellect to appreciate. This intellectual side of beauty predominates in science and mathematics, but Hartshorne argues that the twin contrasts of order / disorder and complexity / simplicity remain. In one of his articles, titled “Science as the Search for the Hidden Beauty of the World” (1982), he chronicles the ways in which ideals of beauty guide pure scientific inquiry and how the deliverances of science themselves are beautiful. Science seeks a proper balance between imagination (for example, theorizing) and observation. Hartshorne speaks of the “romance of science” as “the disclosure of a universe whose wild harmonies surpass the most vivid dreams of imagination not submitting itself to criticism and observational test.” He reminds us that Darwin closed the Origin with “a prose poem on the beauty of the web of life.”

Prediction is one of the goals of scientific inquiry, but even here, there is an aesthetic component. Too little predictability is chaotic but too much predictability is monotonous. Good science is also heuristic, meaning that it is fruitful, leading to more discoveries. But discoveries in the strict sense are not predictable and are often quite surprising. Hartshorne accuses the determinism of traditional Newtonian science of aesthetic failure for it posited absolute regularity as the ideal to the exclusion of spontaneity, chance, and freedom: the adventure of life reduced to mechanistic obedience to law. Hartshorne’s indeterminism, as we have seen, respects the rule of laws of nature but provides a balance between regularity and irregularity. Traditional theology, Hartshorne claims, was as defective from an aesthetic point of view as the traditional philosophy of nature. Classical theologians stressed divine simplicity and unity to the exclusion of complexity and variety. In an article titled “The Aesthetic Dimensions of Religious Experience” (1992) Hartshorne says, “The beauty of the world is in its partly unprogrammed spontaneities.” Hartshorne’s neoclassical theism affirms a world of multiple creative agents in interaction with each other and with God (see “Charles Hartshorne: Dipolar Theism”). In Hartshorne’s view, God is affected by the creatures and, consequently, the divine experience is a complex reality, full of all of the serendipity and tragedy that interactions with others routinely bring. If Hartshorne is correct, there is an ever changing beauty of the world as a whole that is fully appreciated only by deity and to contemplate this divine experience is to have something akin to what classical theologians called the beatific vision (see the discussion of Hartshorne’s aesthetic argument in “Charles Hartshorne: Theistic and Anti-theistic Arguments”).

4. Conclusion: Hartshorne’s Legacy

At an early age, after reading Emerson, Hartshorne says in his introduction to The Logic of Perfection that he resolved “to trust reason to the end.” He left ample evidence that he was true to this purpose. He was, however, sensitive to the many ways in which philosophy is a frail and fallible enterprise. Communication must take place across centuries and across cultural and linguistic boundaries. There is the snobbery and inertia of traditions and what Hartshorne called “cultural lag” in the recognition of genuine insights (“Analysis and Cultural Lag in Philosophy,” 1973). There is the tendency to forget, ignore, or marginalize objections to one’s views; Hartshorne also considered it mistaken to suppose that meeting objections is sufficient for securing the rationality of one’s ideas, or as he wrote in his correspondence with Edgar Sheffield Brightman, to merely defend one’s own “castle of ideas.” As Carnap said, it is one thing to ask what your metaphysical position commits you to, but it is something else again to ask what commits you to your metaphysical position. Despite their knowledge of formal logic, philosophers are also susceptible to the fallacy of affirming the consequent, looking only for confirmation of their views or for arguments favorable to them. There is, finally, the failure to exhaust the logically possible alternatives in considering the solutions for particular philosophical problems. Hartshorne discussed all of these obstacles, and more, to making progress in philosophy, and he took measures to remedy them in his own attempt to trust reason.

Hartshorne distinguished, with Edith Wharton, between those who light new candles and those who are mirrors reflecting the candles that are lit by others. At the close of his autobiography, he remarked that Whitehead and Peirce had done both, and he dared to hope that he had done both. Hartshorne’s own “candle” has perhaps often been missed because he expended a lot of energy reflecting the lights of Whitehead and Peirce. Hartshorne, however, was neither Whiteheadian nor Peircean. This is true not only of his range of interests and expertise—he contributed to the psychology of sensation and to the study of bird song; it is also true of his systematic presentation, development, and defense of the project of metaphysics, as well as of his own distinctive metaphysical system. He lacked for neither ideas nor for arguments to support those ideas. His neoclassical metaphysics is arguably one of the great intellectual achievements of the twentieth century.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources: Books (In Order of Appearance)

Hartshorne, Charles. 1937. Beyond Humanism: Essays in the Philosophy of Nature. Chicago: Willett, Clark & Company. Republished in 1975 by Peter Smith.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1953. Reality as Social Process: Studies in Metaphysics and Religion. Boston: Beacon Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1962. The Logic of Perfection and Other Essays in Neoclassical Metaphysics. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1972. Whitehead’s Philosophy: Selected Essays, 1935-1970. Lincoln, Nebraska: University of Nebraska Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1976. Aquinas to Whitehead: Seven Centuries of Metaphysics of Religion. Milwaukee, Wisconsin: Marquette University Publications.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1983. Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers: An Evaluation of Western Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1984. Creativity in American Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1987. Wisdom as Moderation: A Philosophy of the Middle Way. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1997. The Zero Fallacy and Other Essays in Neoclassical Philosophy, edited by Mohammad Valady. Peru, Illinois: Open Court Publishing Company.
Hartshorne, Charles. 2011. Creative Experiencing: A Philosophy of Freedom, edited by Donald W. Viney and Jincheol O. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Auxier, Randall E. and Mark Y. A. Davies, editors. 2001. Hartshorne and Brightman on God, Process, and Persons: The Correspondence, 1922-1945. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press.
Viney, Donald W., guest editor. 2001. Process Studies, Special Focus on Charles Hartshorne, 30/2 (Fall-Winter)
Viney, Donald W., editor. 2001. Charles Hartshorne’s Letters to a Young Philosopher: 1979-1995. Logos-Sophia, the Journal of the Pittsburg State University Philosophical Society, volume 11. Pittsburg, Kansas.
Viney, Donald W., guest editor. 2011. Process Studies, Special Focus Section: Charles Hartshorne, 40/1 (Spring/Summer): 91–161.
Vetter, Herbert F., editor. 2007. Hartshorne, A New World View: Essays by Charles Hartshorne. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard Square Library.

b. Primary Sources: Hartshorne’s Response to his Critics

“Interrogations of Charles Hartshorne,” conducted by William Alston. 1964. Philosophical Interrogations, edited by Sydney and Beatrice Rome. New York: Holt, Rinehart and Winston: 319–354.
Cobb, John B. Jr. and Franklin L Gamwell, editors. 1984. Existence and Actuality: Conversations with Charles Hartshorne. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Hahn, Lewis Edwin, editor. 1991. The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, The Library of Living Philosophers Volume XX. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.
Kane, Robert and Stephen H. Phillips, editors. 1989. Hartshorne, Process Philosophy and Theology. Albany State University of New York Press.
Sia, Santiago, editor. 1990. Charles Hartshorne’s Concept of God: Philosophical and Theological Responses. Dordrecht, the Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers.

c. Primary Sources: Selected Articles

Hartshorne, Charles. 1932. “Contingency and the New Era in Metaphysics, I.” Journal of Philosophy 29/16. 4 August: 421–431.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1932. “Contingency and the New Era in Metaphysics, II.” Journal of Philosophy 29/17. 18 August: 457–469.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1934. “The New Metaphysics and Current Problems, I.” New Frontier 1/1: 24–31; “The New Metaphysics and current Problems, II.” New Frontier 1/5: 8–14.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1935. “Metaphysics for Positivists.” Philosophy of Science 2/3. July: 287-303.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1945. Entry for “time”, pp. 787-88 in An Encyclopedia of Religion, ed. Vergilius Ferm. New York: Philosophical Library.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1964. “Thinking About Thinking Machines,” Texas Quarterly 7/1. Spring: 131–140.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1970. “The Development of My Philosophy” in John E. Smith (ed.) Contemporary American Philosophy: Second Series, London: Allen & Unwin: 211–28.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1973. “Analysis and Cultural Lag in Philosophy.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 11/2-3: 105–112.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1977. “Bell’s Theorem and Stapp’s Revised View of Space-Time.” Process Studies 7/3 (Fall): 183–191.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1978. “A Philosophy of Death.” Philosophical Aspects of Thanatology, volume 2, edited by Florence M. Hetzler and A. H. Kutscher. New York: MSS Information Corporation: 81–89.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1980. “Mysticism and Rationatistic Metaphysics.” Understanding Mysticism, edited by Richard Woods. Garden City, New York: Image: 415–421.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1981. “Concerning Abortion: An Attempt at a Rational View.” The Christian Century 98/2. 21 January: 42–45.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1982. “Science as the Search for the Hidden Beauty of the World.” The Aesthetic Dimension of Science 1980 Nobel Conference, Number 16, ed. Deane W. Curtin. New York: Philosophical Library, 1982): 85–106.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1987. “Mind and Body: A Special Case of Mind and Mind.” A Process Theory of Medicine: Interdisciplinary Essays, edited by Marcus Ford. Lewiston, New York: Edwin Mellen Press: 77–88.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1987. “A Metaphysics of Universal Freedom.” Faith and Creativity, Essays in Honor of Eugene H. Peters, edited by George Nordgulen and George W. Shields. St. Louis, Missouri: CBP Press: 27–40.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1988. “Some Principles of Procedure in Metaphysics.” The Nature of Metaphysical Knowledge, edited by G. F. McLean and Hugo Meynell. Lanham, New York: University Press of America: 69–75.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1988. “Sankara, Nagarjuna, and Fa Tsang, with Some Western Analogues.” Interpreting Across Boundaries: New Essays in Comparative Philosophy, edited by G. J. Larson and Eliot Deutsch. Princeton University Press: 98–115.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1989. “Von Wright and Hume’s Axiom.” The Philosophy of Georg Henrik von Wright, edited by Paul Arthur Schilpp and Lewis Edwin Hahn. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court: 59–76.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1990. “Hegel, Logic, and Metaphysics,” CLIO 19/4: 345–352.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1991. “An Open Letter to Carl Sagan.” The Journal of Speculative Philosophy 5/4: 227–232.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1992. “The Aesthetic Dimensions of Religious Experience.” Logic, God and Metaphysics, ed. J. F. Harris. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 9–18.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1993. “Can Philosophers Cooperate Intellectually: Metaphysics as Applied Mathematics.” The Midwest Quarterly 35/1. Autumn: 8–20.
Hartshorne, Charles. 1994. “Three Important Scientists on Mind, Matter, and the Metaphysics of Religion.” The Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 8/3: 211–227.

d. Secondary Sources

Chancey, Anita. 1999. “Rationality, Contributionism, and the Value of Love: Hartshorne on Abortion.” Process Studies 28/1-2. Spring-Summer: 85–97.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 1988. Hartshorne and the Metaphysics of Animal Rights. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Dombrowski, Daniel A. 2004. Divine Beauty: The Aesthetics of Charles Hartshorne. Nashville, Tennessee: Vanderbilt University Press.
Easterbrook, Gregg. 1998. “A Hundred Years of Thinking About God, A Philosopher Soon to be Rediscovered,” U.S. News & World Report. February 23: 61, 65.
Fitzgerald, Paul. 1972. “Relativity Physics and the God of Process Philosophy.” Process Studies 2/4. Winter: 251–276.
Ford, Lewis S. 1968. “Is Process Theism Compatible with Relativity Theory?” Journal of Religion 48/2. April: 124–135.
Ford, Lewis S., editor. 1973. Two Process Philosophers: Hartshorne’s Encounter with Whitehead. Tallahassee, Florida: American Academy of Religion.
Griffin, David Ray, John B. Cobb Jr., Marcus P. Ford, Pete A. Y. Gunter, and Peter Ochs. 1993. Founders of Constructive Postmodern Philosophy: Peirce, James, Bergson, Whitehead, and Hartshorne. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Jesse, Jennifer G. and J. Wesley Robbins, editors. 2001. American Journal of Theology & Philosophy, memorial issue in tribute to Charles Hartshorne, 22/2. May.
Minor, William S., editor. 1969. Charles Hartshorne and Henry Nelson Wieman. Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
Myers, William, guest editor. 1998. The Personalist Forum, Special Issue on Charles Hartshorne, 14/2. Fall.
Peters, Eugene H. 1970. Hartshorne and Neoclassical Metaphysics. Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
Peters, Eugene H. 1976. “Philosophic Insights of Charles Hartshorne,” Southwestern Journal of Philosophy, VII, 1/17: 157–170.
Ramal, Randy, editor. 2010. Metaphysics, Analysis, and the Grammar of God: Process and Analytic Voices in Dialogue .Tübingen, Germany: Mohr Siebeck.
Reck, Andrew J. 1961. “The Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne,” Tulane Studies in Philosophy X. May: 89–108.
Reese, William L. and Eugene Freeman, editors. 1964. Process and Divinity: Philosophical Essays Presented to Charles Hartshorne: The Hartshorne Festchrift. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court Publishing Company.
Shields, George W. 1992. “Infinitesimals and Hartshorne’s Set-Theoretic Platonism” The Modern Schoolman 49/2. January.
Shields, George W. 2004. “Process and Universals” in After Whitehead: Rescher on Process Metaphysics, ed. by M. Weber. Frankfurt: Ontos Verlag.
Shields, George W. 2008. “‘Beyond Enlightened Self-Interest’ Revisited: Process Philosophy and the Biology of Altruism” in Researching with Whitehead: Essays in Honor of John B. Cobb, Jr., ed. by F. Riffert and Hans-Joachim Sander. Muenchen: Verlag Karl Alber.
Shields, George W. 2008. “MWI Quantum Theory: Some Logical and Philosophical Issues,” paper presented at the Center for Philosophy and Natural Sciences, California State University-Sacramento.
Shields, George W. 2009. “Quo Vadis?: On Current Prospects for Process Philosophy and Theology,” The American Journal of Theology & Philosophy, 30/2. May.
Shields, George W. 2010. “Eternal Objects, Middle Knowledge, and Hartshorne: A Response to Malone-France,” Process Studies, 39/1. Spring/Summer: 149–165.
Shields, George W. 2010. “Panexperientialism, Quantum Theory, and Neuroplasticity” in Process Approaches to Consciousness, eds. Michel Weber and A. Weekes. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Shields, George W., editor. 2003. Process and Analysis: Whitehead, Hartshorne, and the Analytic Tradition. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Simoni-Wastila, Henry. 1999. “Is Divine Relativity Possible? Charles Hartshorne on God’s Sympathy with the World.” Process Studies 28/1-2. Spring-Summer: 98–116.
Sprigge, T. L. S. 2006. The God of Metaphysics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Suchocki, Marjorie Hewitt and John B. Cobb, Jr. editors. 1992. Process Studies, Special Issue on the Philosophy of Charles Hartshorne, 21/2. Summer.
Viney, Donald Wayne. 2008. “Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000),” Handbook of Whiteheadian Process Thought, Volume 2, edited by Michel Weber and Will Desmond. Frankfurt / Paris / Lancaster: Ontos Verlag: 589–596.
Viney, Donald Wayne and Rebecca Viney. 1993. “For the Beauty of the Earth: A Hartshornean Ecological Aesthetic.” Proceedings of the Institute for Liberal Studies: Science, Technology & Religious Ideas, volume 4. Frankfort: Kentucky State University: 38–44.
Whitehead, Alfred North. 1978 [1929]. Process and Reality: An Essay in Cosmology, corrected edition, edited by David Ray Griffin and Donald W. Sherburne. New York: Free Press.
Wilcox, John T. 1961. “A Question from Physics for Certain Theists.” Journal of Religion 40/4. October: 293–300.

e. Bibliography

“Primary Bibliography of Philosophical Works of Charles Hartshorne” (compiled by Dorothy Hartshorne; corrected, revised, and updated by Donald Wayne Viney and Randy Ramal) in Herbert F. Vetter, editor, Hartshorne: A New World View: Essays by Charles Hartshorne. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard Square Library, 2007: 129–160. Also published in Santiago Sia, Religion, Reason and God. Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang, 2004: 195–223.

Author Information

Donald Wayne Viney
Email: don_viney@yahoo.com
Pittsburg State University
U. S. A.

and

George W. Shields
Email: George.shields@kysu.edu
Kentucky State University
U. S. A.

Political Constructivism

Political Constructivism is a method for producing and defending principles of justice and legitimacy. It is most closely associated with John Rawls’ technique of subjecting our deliberations about justice to certain hypothetical constraints. Rawls argued that if all of us reason in the light of these conditions we could arrive at the same judgment about justice. Moreover, our shared judgment about justice is justified precisely because it resulted from a suitably structured deliberative process. This is constructivism’s key idea; it holds that certain complex entities are constructed from more fundamental elements.

In moral and political constructivism, the complex entities are moral and political principles or obligations, such as the principle to each according to his merits or the obligations created through contracts. The debates surrounding constructivism tend to concern the nature of these elements and the process by which they get assembled. Some constructivists are more subjective insofar as they cast these elements as attitudes and values of living agents or as the settled political values of a particular society. Others are more objective insofar as they identify these elements with universal precepts of practical reason working in combination with abstract conceptions of persons and society. In each case, the constructivist holds the view that these elements—no matter how they are specified—are brought together in a set of reasons favoring one principle over another. The process by which this happens is a process of construction, since the human mind actively assembles the considerations from which a principle is formulated; it does not passively receive its formulation. Absent this active mental process, there are no criteria for guiding political action or justifying our political institutions—neither a way to properly assess our genuine political obligations. In order to perform these evaluative tasks, we must construct the metric of assessment. Political constructivism is a philosophical account for how this constructing happens, and how the process confers moral authority on the resulting principles.

Introduction
A Brief History
Political Constructivism: Two Formulations
Political Constructivism and Procedures
Political Constructivism and Social Problems
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The term “constructivism” is still relatively new to political and moral theory. It emerged sometime in the second half of the twentieth century to describe John Rawls’ general approach to normative political theory. Since first appearing, it has developed into a family of positions in normative ethics, political philosophy, and metaethics. The term “political constructivism” is newer still and sometimes used to describe the approach Rawls employed in Political Liberalism, which attempts to steer clear of any controversial metaphysical suppositions by drawing heavily on the ideals and values implicit in a democratic society. More generally, it is used to describe the application of constructivism to the political domain. On this general understanding, political constructivism not only covers all of Rawls’ political works, but any political work guided by the idea that an appropriate thought process confers authority onto the resulting political principles. Moreover, since human thought creates the political principles governing our society, human thought can analyze those same principles and either affirm or refute their justification. The fact that we can analyze our principles—and by extension the policies based on them—suggests that we can reason about politics, and the constructivist maintains that our reasons should go a long way toward reconciling political debate and generating agreement in judgment.

This general idea of political constructivism is not too different from other, more familiar views, such as the claim that appropriate prices are the result of open and competitive markets, or the idea that legitimate representatives of a democratic society are the winners of open and fair elections. In each of these cases, the entity in question can be explained in terms of a more fundamental process, for instance, the decisions of various people engaged in markets or electoral processes, together with an explanation of what it means for these processes to be ‘open,’ ‘competitive,’ or ‘fair.’ Political constructivism reflects a similar idea insofar as principles of political action result from a thought-process involving elements more fundamental than the principles themselves, such as attitudes, concepts, ideals, beliefs, values, and precepts. Together, these building blocks help establish a particular set of principles as justified, appropriate, objective, or valid. As a result, constructivism is the view that the best set of political principles is the outcome of an appropriate form of thinking. Importantly, there is no criterion beyond this form of thinking by which we can assess the appropriateness of the principles.

Although constructivism begins with a simple idea, its conception of thinking, or practical reason, is ambitious. We can see this by contrasting it with two competing conceptions of practical deliberations that are more familiar in everyday experience. The first frames practical deliberations within a means-ends relationship whereby practical reason identifies the means by which certain ends are realized. For example, every day we are led by reason to conclude that eating certain foods will satisfy our hunger. In this case, the end to be achieved is immediately given by our natural desire for food; our reason simply discovers the means for satisfying that desire. A second view of practical reason is concerned not merely with identifying the means to some immediately given end, but also with ensuring that the means or action conforms to some moral principle. For example, we may prefer to lie about a particular event, but because we are committed to a principle of honesty, we tell the truth. On this view, the capacity of practical reason extends beyond its instrumental role by including within it a power to check our impulses against moral principles. Notice, however, that in this second example, the rule on which our action is based is still given. There is no implicit or explicit claim that practical reason produces the principle. Instead, practical reason passively receives its command and acts within its limits.

Political constructivism is a different view altogether. The various political principles constraining political action are not merely given to us, but rather are the products of thought. They are not products in the sense of being created from nothing, but rather constructed from various resources appropriate to political argument. Apart from these constructions, there are no moral facts or true moral judgments, nor are there ways of assessing the moral worth of a political action. It is only when deliberations are properly constrained that the resulting outcome is a principle against which our actions can be assessed as morally right or wrong.

Notice that while our political actions are assessed against a normative principle, there is no criterion beyond the deliberative process by which the rightness of the principle is assessed; it is authoritative in virtue of being the outcome of a certain kind of deliberative process or a certain form of argument. Consequently, the challenge for constructivism is to explain the appropriateness of the process without appealing to any judgment that is supposed to derive from that process; for if the thought process relied on such a judgment to assess its appropriateness, it would assume the very thing it claims to construct. It has been argued that constructivism fails to meet this challenge on logical grounds (Cohen 2008). But others have attempted to meet it, and in turn have created a variety of interpretations. This makes the approach difficult to define and summarize. Naturally, a great deal of philosophical debate surrounds the appropriateness of the deliberative process, especially as it concerns the metaethical themes of justification and objectivity. At any rate, despite the extensive literature on the subject, there are two general formulations of political constructivism influenced by two historical accounts of practical reasons. The first is a deontological account of practical reason that is primarily associated with Kantian ethics. The second is a teleological account of practical reason that is primarily associated with social contract theory. The Kantian and social contract traditions, although offering differing accounts of practical reason, share much in common, and it would not be an exaggeration to cast constructivism as a contemporary attempt to explain the Rousseauian idea of moral freedom as acting on a law one gives oneself complemented by the Kantian idea that the law one gives oneself is out of one’s reason. Political constructivism tries to make this idea clear by identifying a compelling form of normative political analysis with easily understood criteria for thinking about political issues. The hope is that once we are equipped with this form of analysis, we can reason in the light of these criteria and reach agreement in political judgment; and, if not agreement, we can at least narrow our differences sufficiently to secure a just, or fair, or honorable, or decent set of political relations (Rawls 1993, 120).

This article frames political constructivism as a general way of applying constructivism to the political domain. It discusses various interpretations in light of the two general formulations noted above—deontology and teleology. Although the various interpretations discussed do not always fit easily within this distinction, it is nevertheless a useful way of examining political constructivism because deontology and teleology straddle a historical fault line for how best to think about practical reason and the justification of political principles. According to the deontological approach, practical reason is modeled on a mathematical deduction; the aim is to create an argument that should be, so far as possible, a deductive one. By contrast, a teleological account of practical reason has an instrumental form; the aim is to explain how political principles function to realize some end. Examining political constructivism in the light of these formulations exposes the key logical difference between the various interpretations of political constructivism and sets the stage for assessing whether a particular interpretation is more favorable than others.

2. A Brief History

Although the historical influences of constructivism date back to the social contract and Kantian traditions, the contemporary usage of the term seems to have originated with Ronald Dworkin’s 1973 article, “The Original Position” (Dworkin 1973). In this article, Dworkin defends a constructive model of Rawls’s reflective equilibrium over a natural model. Reflective equilibrium refers to a strategy for justifying political principles often associated with political constructivism. The important point here is that a natural model views the relation between moral principles and our more intuitive judgments about ethics as analogous to the relation between scientific laws and empirical data. On a natural model, political theory aims at discovering and describing the normative laws that explain our moral intuitions, not unlike the way natural science aims at discovering and describing the laws of nature that explain our sensory intuitions about the world outside of us. By contrast, a constructive model presents political theory as analogous to legal theory. On this view, political theory aims at constructing political principles that can account for our moral intuitions by bringing as many of those intuitions into a coherent whole with one another, not unlike a judge who, on deciding a case, constructs a legal principle that brings precedent into a coherent whole with a novel yet plausible interpretation of a legal concept.

Dworkin’s constructive model captures a feature of constructivism that has endured until the twenty-first century, namely, that political principles depend on us; they are mind-dependent and result from some interpretive work on our part. To bring this feature into sharp relief, Dworkin contrasts a constructive model to a natural model, again foreshadowing a move familiar in the literature; for it is often the case that constructivists contrast their positions to moral realism when developing their arguments. Moral realism takes many forms, but a common feature of moral realism is that it frames moral judgments in terms of our detecting moral facts. We discover these moral facts not unlike the way we discover the color red—we passively receive the datum. Moreover, these entities are simple in that they cannot be analyzed any further; there are no fundamental elements brought together into a set of consideration from which political principles are formulated. Constructivism differs with moral realism on these various points. In contrast to realism, constructivism holds that actions are judged as right or wrong by measuring those actions against principles that are themselves constructed, not detected. Moreover, these principles are justified in virtue of being constructed from more fundamental elements through an appropriate thought process.

The first major attempt to explicitly develop a constructivist position was John Rawls’ “A Kantian Constructivism in Moral Theory,” first published in 1980. Prior to “A Kantian Constructivism,” Rawls used the metaphor of a ‘contract’ rather than ‘construction’ to describe his theory, tending instead to use the adjective constructive to mean capable of settling moral disputes. “A refutation of intuitionism,” he writes, “consists in presenting the sort of constructive criteria that are said not to exist” (Rawls 1999a, 35). The aim of A Theory of Justice is to defend precisely these constructive criteria. In “Kantian Constructivism,” Rawls introduces the term constructivism without explanation and uses it to denote a particular kind of political argument reflecting a particular view about justification and objectivity. He writes:

Kantian constructivism holds that moral objectivity is to be understood in terms of a suitably constructed social point of view that all can accept. Apart from the procedure of constructing the principles of justice, there are no moral facts. Whether certain facts are to be recognized as reasons of right and justice, or how much they are to count, can be ascertained only from within the constructive procedure, that is, from the undertakings of rational agents of construction when

suitably represented as free and equal moral persons (Rawls 1999b, 307).

This suggests a two-step process: (1) constructing a social point of view acceptable to all, and (2) constructing principles of justice from within that point of view. Somewhere between the publication of “Kantian Constructivism” and Political Liberalism, published in 1993, Rawls decides to express himself differently. When explaining political constructivism, Rawls clarifies what he takes to be constructed:

First, in this form of constructivism, what is it that is constructed? Answer: the content of a political conception of justice. In justice as fairness this content is the principles of justice selected by the parties in the original position … A second question is this: as a procedural device of representation, is the original position itself constructed? No: it is simply laid out (Rawls 1993, 103).

The two-step construction noted above is now reduced to one step, namely, constructing the principles of justice. The social point of view from which the construction takes place is not constructed, but simply laid out. The varieties of constructivism that follow the publication of Rawls’ “Kantian Constructivism” represent competing views on how these separate tasks are to be conducted. While each variant lays out a social point of view and defends competing principles, they have in common the basic idea that the appropriate set of political principles is the outcome of an appropriate form of thinking. Moral judgments are correct when they conform to these principles. The task of political argument is to join together all the relevant elements into one unified scheme of practical reason, that is, a social point of view, so that the deliberations constrained by that scheme arrive at—or construct—the proper principles of justice. Absent this scheme, there are no criteria for guiding political action or justifying our institutions.

And so, in 1980, constructivism begins to take shape as a distinctive approach to moral and political theory. In the decades following “Kantian Constructivism,” the literature on constructivism proliferates at an increasingly fast rate, and an increasing percentage of the literature focuses on moral constructivism rather than political constructivism. The publications of T. M. Scanlon, Christine Korsgaard, and Onora O’Neill begin to form a body of work that, together with John Rawls’, shapes key debates in normative ethics and political philosophy as well as in metaethics.

3. Political Constructivism: Two Formulations

The central idea behind political constructivism is that an appropriate set of political principles is constructed from suitably formed deliberations. These deliberations assemble fundamental elements—such as attitudes, concepts, ideals, beliefs, values and precepts, along with their application to certain problems or contexts in which our normative deliberations take root—into a set of reasons from which principles are formulated. This is an abstract idea that needs to be filled out with some content if it is to be fully understood. The most famous and substantial formulation of it is John Rawls’ theory of justice, which he calls justice as fairness. Justice as fairness begins with a simple idea: the most appropriate conception of justice is one that people would choose in a fair situation (Rawls 1999b, 310). A fair situation is a hypothetical choice procedure called the original position. It organizes various concepts, considered judgments, and precepts into a procedure that frames deliberations. Anyone deliberating within this procedure will reason according to these elements of rationality and reasonableness. In other words, these building blocks provide the raw material from which principles of justice are constructed.

What are these starting points? They include common precepts of rationality, such as: If one desires a particular end, it is rational to follow the means for achieving that end; if the end can be realized in more than one way, it is rational to choose the less burdensome way; if agreements between parties are mutually beneficial and each party can be given full assurance that the other will abide by the terms of the agreement, it is rational to enter into the agreement; if times are uncertain, it is rational to rank alternatives by their worst possible outcome and then pick the alternative with the least worst outcome. These precepts of rationality are guided in their application toward a particular set of ends called primary goods. In addition to these precepts of rationality and their related ends, the original position attempts to model precepts of reasonableness. Reasonable people are ready to propose principles as fair terms of social cooperation and to abide by them willingly, even at the cost of their own interests in particular situations, provided that others accept those terms. Rawls models reasonableness into the original position by including within it a veil of ignorance that precludes parties from knowing their specific circumstances: a condition of publicity that ensures parties understand the public nature of the agreement; a symmetric positioning of the parties’ situation with respect to one another; formal constraints of generality and universality; and, a list of traditional principles from which the parties choose (Rawls 1999a, 105–130).

The precepts of rationality and reasonableness are modeled as a thought procedure anyone can enter into at any time. In A Theory of Justice, Rawls argues that anyone deliberating from within the original position will arrive at the same conclusion—they will choose the same two principles of justice. As a result, the original position realizes the general aim of constructivism by bringing together abstract precepts of rationality with a conception of persons and society in a set of reasons that supports a particular set of principles. Indeed, Rawls’s procedural argument is so well known and so well developed that constructivism is often taken to be synonymous with the idea that whatever results from a hypothetical thought experiment, such as the original position, constitutes the correct set of principles. For example, some describe the constructivist as a hypothetical proceduralist. “He endorses some hypothetical procedure as determining which principles constitute valid standards of morality” (Darwall, Gibbard, and Railton 1992, 140). Similarly, Brian Barry defines constructivism as “a theory to the effect that what comes out of a certain kind of situation is to count as just” (Barry 1991, 266). Sharon Street says that the bumper sticker slogan of constructivism is “no normative truth independent of the practical point of view” (Street 2010, 366). The works of T. M. Scanlon deepen the characterization of constructivism as a form of proceduralism, and critics have further solidified this interpretation by fixing on various weaknesses of procedural arguments. The combined effect is that proceduralism has become the default interpretation of political constructivism.

Proceduralism has taken many forms since the publication of A Theory of Justice. For example, Rawls’ later works use complex conceptions of persons and society to give the original position a more substantive form (Rawls 1993, 93). Since these conceptions are informed by the shared public values of a democratic society, the starting points of construction are more substantive than those identified by A Theory of Justice. Indeed, many of the debates and criticisms of a procedural formulation of political constructivism center on whether the starting points should be more universal and objective, as in A Theory of Justice, or more local and substantive, as in Political Liberalism.

The procedural interpretation of political constructivism is by far the most common, but it is not the only one. A second, less developed account is already present in “A Kantian Constructivism” where Rawls draws a link between the original position and the practical task of political argument. Rawls begins his article in a manner consistent with a procedural formulation by noting that “What distinguishes a Kantian form of constructivism is essentially this: it specifies a particular conception of the person as an element in a reasonable procedure of construction, the outcome of which determines the content of the first principles of justice” (Rawls 1999b, 304). However, he quickly adds that the Kantian conception of justice is meant to address an impasse in our recent political history, namely, “the apparent conflict between freedom and equality in a democratic society” (Rawls 1999b, 305). This impasse, and the attempt to break it, impacts the argument’s logical structure, for principles are now justified in virtue of their breaking the impasse rather than in virtue of being the outcome of a choice procedure. Constructivism becomes “political” not because it appropriates political values, but because it engages in a practical enterprise of solving political problems. Christine Korsgaard expresses this idea when she writes, “Rawls, like Hobbes before him, thinks that justice is the solution to a problem” (C. Korsgaard 2003, 112). On this formulation, justice as fairness is justified if it solves the conflict between freedom and equality in a democratic society. If it does not solve the problem, it is unjustified.

This second account of constructivism might be called the practical formulation of constructivism. Together with the procedural account, political constructivism reflects two great traditions of moral and political thought—Kantian ethics and social contract theory. Like the procedural formulation of constructivism, Kant employed the Categorical Imperative to determine whether subjective maxims are universalizable and thus objectively valid. The Kantian Categorical Imperative specifies a moral point of view that might be described as “suitably joining together all the requirements of our (human) practical reason, both pure and empirical, into one unified scheme of practical reasons” (Rawls 1999b, 515). This scheme guides deliberations so as to construct correct moral judgments. By contrast, the social contract tradition identifies the state of nature as a structural problem in need of rectification. It is the nature of the problem that frames deliberations on the content of the contract. Once the contract is established and agreed upon, it places new obligations upon the contracting parties, thereby constructing a moral order that had previously not existed.

The development of constructivism over the past three decades reflects these two traditions. Sometimes the particular variant of constructivism emphasizes one tradition over the other; sometimes it trades on both. In any case, a critical division between the variants concerns whether the constructed set of principles are formulated and justified independently of any conception of the good those principles might later realize, or whether the constructed set of principles are formulated and justified in relation to the good those principles might later realize. The former is deontological; the latter is teleological. Procedural formulations are typically deontic in that they are fashioned on mathematical proofs that move from widely acceptable axioms to more substantial political theorems. Practical formulations tend to be teleological insofar as the practical analysis is guided by the good that would be realized should that problem be resolved.

The procedural and practical formulations of constructivism serve as two entry points for understanding how political constructivism has been applied and might further be developed. Whether one formulation proves more successful depends on whether one can make more sense of the idea that the best political action is an action conforming to a normative law we give ourselves out of reasons we all can share. Only that variant will be “constructive” in the sense of being “capable” of settling moral charged political disputes. Or, absent the ambitious goal of actually settling disputes on reasons we all can share, the successful variant should at least fix the point at which political disagreements arise by bringing out into the light of day the reasons why people arrive at political judgments that are not only different but are in fact incommensurable.

4. Political Constructivism and Procedures

One way to describe the procedural formulation of political constructivism more thoroughly is to recall that constructivism can be characterized as a view about the nature of political argument or analysis, especially as it pertains to justification and objectivity. If political principles are to be justified as obligatory and morally authoritative, it is insufficient to derive them from a social point of view without also explaining why that social point of view is also authoritative; for absent a defense of the point of view, the purported justification of principles will appear wanting. In the course of time since Dworkin introduced the term, political philosophers have developed three general strategies for defending the elements of a procedure. They include reflective equilibrium, narrowing the scope of the investigation, and, at its most ambitious, elucidating the demands of practical reason from which normative political principles can be established.

Reflective equilibrium refers to a back and forth process that seeks coherence among the different parts of a conception of justice. These parts include the principles of justice, the conditions of the hypothetical procedure, and the firm moral judgments we make in everyday life. Once equilibrium is achieved, the different parts of the theory are justified in terms of their mutual support. The “key idea underlying reflective equilibrium is that we test various parts of our system of moral beliefs against other beliefs we hold, seeking coherence among the widest set of moral and non-moral beliefs by revising and refining them at all levels” (Daniels 1996, 2). Accordingly, the fundamental elements comprising a hypothetical procedure are justified in virtue of their supporting and being supported by the match between the outcome of the procedure (the principles of justice) and our firmly held moral intuitions, which Rawls calls considered judgments. “By going back and forth,” Rawls writes, “sometimes altering the conditions of the contractual circumstances [hypothetical procedure], at others withdrawing our [considered] judgments and conforming them to principle, I assume that eventually we shall find a description of the initial situation that both expresses reasonable conditions and yields principles which match our considered judgments duly pruned and adjusted. This state of affairs I refer to as reflective equilibrium” (Rawls 1999a, 18).

Critics have raised tough questions about a coherentist justification of political principles; for if our intuitive moral judgments form part of the justificatory process, then the resulting principles cannot serve as independent standards against which those same judgments can be assessed and found wanting (Hare 1973, 147; Nagel 1973, 228; Sandel 1998, 49). The risk of circular reasoning slips into the process and thus undermines its justificatory force. To strengthen the critical dimension of the resulting political principles, procedural constructivists have tended to move in either one of two directions. They have either conceded moral breadth in order to strengthen the justificatory core of constructivism by narrowing the scope of its investigation (James 2012; Roberts 2007), or they have refocused their attention on accounts of agency and rationality in order to more clearly elucidate the demands of practical reason (O’Neill 1996).

Rawls’ writings subsequent to A Theory of Justice can be interpreted as taking the former path. In these works, he paid increasingly close attention to liberal values by linking justification to “our deeper understanding of ourselves and our aspirations,” and bracketing “claims about the essential nature and identity of persons” (Rawls 1999b, 306–07, 388). The conditions of the original position are therefore conditions already accepted by members of a liberal democracy, or conditions such members could be made to accept because of their implicit presence within the public culture of a democratic society they share. The hope is that by localizing practical reason to a particular kind of political tradition one can simultaneously strengthen the justification of the argument for that audience. There is no attempt to provide a comprehensive normative political argument true for all peoples at all times. Instead, the program is much more modest, relying on values already at home in the subject addressed.

This strategy has been criticized on a number of grounds. Some have questioned the veracity of Rawls’s empirical claims, others worry that the search for stability within a pluralist society lowers the bar of justification too much, and still others claim that Rawls’ conception of persons remain too ideal and detached from reality (Klosko 1993; Barry 1995; O’Neill 1996). Although these criticisms are forceful objections of the usual interpretation of Rawls’ Political Liberalism, Aaron James has developed a variant of the strategy less susceptible to them. James describes political constructivism as “a methodology of substantive justification… The hope is to show, as though by something vaguely akin to mathematical demonstration, that proposed principles can be worked out, in steps which are themselves manifestly reasonable, from rudimentary and highly plausible ideas arising from within a society’s own essentially social kind of practical reason” (James 2013, 251–52). The aim is to “justify principles that tell us how existing versions of the practice would have to be reformed if they are to be justifiable” (James 2012, 29). If practices such as constitutional democracies or global free trade regimes are not inherently unjust, then this could be an attractive path to pursue, since the fundamental elements from which principles are constructed are contained within the practice itself. These elements include the practice’s participants, its purpose, and the circumstances favorable to its continuation over time. Provided the description of the practice is accurate and generally acceptable, the argument in favor of a particular set of principles should be authoritative to that practice.

One criticism of this strategy is that it turns a contingent empirical fact into an absolute constraint on ones conception of justice, thereby undermining that conception’s critical leverage by rendering it ill equipped to determine why these practices might fall short of justice (Valentini 2011, 412). This becomes apparent in Rawls’ Law of Peoples, which “sets out guidelines for a liberal society’s foreign policy in a reasonably just Society of Peoples” (Rawls 2001, 128). The concern is that a state-centric global order (or peoples-centric global order) lends itself to certain injustices because there are no overarching institutions that can foster trust and cooperation among nations. The Law of Peoples fails to shed light on the unwelcomed incentives created by a state-centric order, since it assumes from the beginning that the practice is normatively innocuous and, as a result, risks justifying an unjust, or less than fully just, status quo.

In order to avoid this outcome, one would have to either attach the fundamental elements of construction to the good realized by the practice in question, or move in the opposite direction by recovering the more abstract features of practical rationality. The former option shifts the grounds of justification toward a teleological structure of justification, which is associated with a practical formulation of constructivism discussed in the next section. The latter option alone remains within the framework of a deontological justification, and is perhaps best illustrated by some of the work of Onora O’Neill. O’Neill’s constructivism abstracts from our more richly idealized conception of persons by articulating more meager—and thus what she believes to be more easily justifiable—precepts of rationality, agency, and mutual independence (O’Neill 1988). For example, O’Neill maintains that rationality can be construed as the capacity to understand and follow some form of social life; and mutual independence can be interpreted as an agent’s capacity to develop varying sorts and degrees of dependency and interdependency. These elements help frame the question: What principles can a plurality of agents of minimal rationality and with varying degrees of dependence live by? While these minimal, formal requirements of rationality and agency might be too meager to construct substantive principles of justice entitling people to certain goods, O’Neill thinks they can inform us as to which principles a group cannot live by. The elements of construction therefore help us construct principles of obligation prohibiting those actions that undermine the capacity for agency.

O’Neill’s variant reclaims the moral breadth and universality of normative political principles by constructing them from fundamental elements that are generally weak and widely acceptable. She believes every rational person can understand and accept these fundamental elements and thus can agree on the obligations constraining their actions. Rawls suggests something similar in A Theory of Justice. Like O’Neill, Rawls thinks that the justification of justice as fairness is in part defended on generally shared and preferably weak conditions. Moreover, his published articles leading up to A Theory of Justice have been described as beginning with “as narrow and morally neutral a conception of rational agency as can plausibly be drawn” (Wolff 1977, 13). The ambition reflected in these works concerns the derivation of substantive principles from formal premises through a kind of rational choice bargaining game. O’Neill can be interpreted as developing a similar position by returning to these earlier ambitions, albeit not in the language of rational choice theory. Together with the more descriptively rich practice-based variant suggested by James, the procedural formulation of constructivism can be characterized as moving in either an abstract, more universal direction, or a substantive, more localized direction. Some have tried to bridge the two ends of the spectrum by suggesting various levels of construction. For example, Peri Roberts argues that primary constructions start from bare concepts of persons and society and formulate general principles of justice with universal scope (Roberts 2007). However, once armed with these bare concepts and general principles, the constructivist can thicken the concepts in a secondary procedure by drawing on the ideals and values of a particular society.

What is common to each of these arguments is their form. Each aims to construct an argument modeled on a mathematical demonstration. The hope is to move from generally weak and broadly acceptable axioms to more substantial political theorems via a procedure of construction. The strength of this form of constructivist argument depends not only on the plausibility of the procedure, but also on whether the appropriateness of the procedure can be specified without appealing to the kinds of normative judgments the procedure is supposed to produce; for if the appropriateness of the procedure depended on such judgments, it would assume the very thing it claims to construct. G. A. Cohen has argued that Rawls’ constructivism fails to meet this challenge because the two principles resulting from the original position depend for their justification on unarticulated background principles of justice (Cohen 2008). Cohen’s argument is based on a deeper thesis about the relationship between facts and principles. On Cohen’s view, “a principle can respond to (that is, be grounded in) a fact only because it is also a response to a more ultimate principle that is not a response to a fact” (Cohen 2008, 229). This is a logical argument. If it is correct it strikes a notable blow against the constructivist position; for if the procedure reflects factual considerations, as they often do, then Cohen can maintain that anyone affirming a principle resulting from the procedure must also affirm a more fundamental principle surviving denial of those same facts. These fact-insensitive principles are the valid principles of justice; they are logically prior to the principles generated by a procedure and thus are not themselves constructed.

Cohen’s criticism is directed against John Rawls, but it applies to any form of constructivism that uses facts about persons and society when formulating the procedure. The general idea, already reflected in a number of other criticisms of constructivism, is that the process of constructing substantive normative principles relies upon unarticulated, non-constructed principles. Consequently, the constructivist cannot maintain the view that all political principles are constructed.

5. Political Constructivism and Social Problems

In A Theory of Justice, Rawls writes: “The theory of justice is a part, perhaps the most significant part, of the theory of rational choice” (Rawls 1999a, 15). Describing A Theory of Justice as a rational choice theory is less common than it used to be. In his Reconstruction and Critique of A Theory of Justice, Robert Paul Wolff speculates that Rawls’ “original intention must have been to write a book very much like Kenneth Arrow’s Social Choice and Individual Values” (Wolff 1977, 4). Wolff then continues to interpret Rawls’s working terms of a rational choice model. Similarly, in his 1989 treatise, Theories of Justice, Brian Barry interprets Rawls’ argument from two perspectives: a rational choice model and a competing approach Barry calls justice as impartiality. A rational choice characterization of A Theory of Justice views the participants of the original position as engaged in a bargaining contract concerning political principles. The failure to establish an agreement returns a person to her position or holdings prior to any cooperative arrangement, and this position is called the noncooperative baseline. Now, it is assumed that the parties are rationally motivated by their own self-interests to move beyond the noncooperative baseline and arrive at a mutually advantageous arrangement. In rational choice theory, the most mutually advantageous series of outcomes is referred to as the Pareto Frontier. It represents a series of efficient outcomes insofar as it is not possible to move away from the frontier so as to improve one person’s position without worsening another’s. The deliberations within the original position represent a move away from a noncooperative baseline to a specific point on the Pareto Frontier.

Rawls would later regret having described his theory as part of a rational choice theory, calling it a very misleading error (Rawls 1999b, 401). Nevertheless, what is particularly interesting about a rational choice characterization of A Theory of Justice is that it reflects, to some extent, the two different formulations of constructivism. On the one hand, rational choice models embody the rigor and certainty of mathematical demonstrations insofar as substantive conclusions are thought to derive from premises that, though not formal, are generally weak and widely acceptable. The procedural formulation of constructivism reflects this mathematical model. On the other hand, rational choice models are often described as solutions to problems cast as bargaining games. If the bargaining game concerns the problem of justice—or how the benefits and burdens of social cooperation are to be divided among people conceived as free and equal—then the problem itself contains normative resources for constructing the principles that will serve as the solution. The practical formulation of constructivism reflects this key idea. Notice that the two formulations locate the resources for constructing political principles in different places. The procedural account locates the fundamental elements in generally weak and broadly acceptable ideas and precepts. These building blocks are articulated independently of the good they may help bring about when assembled into principles and applied to the situation. Conversely, the practical account locates the fundamental elements of construction in relation to the good realized when the principles are applied. This is because principles of justice are conceived as solutions to problems rather than outcomes of procedures. We begin not with generally weak and widely acceptable ideas about persons and society but rather with particular problems faced by individuals. Moreover, it is in formulating the problem clearly that we are directed to its solution, since the problem contains recourses that will point us in the direction of its solution. It is with these resources that the practical account of constructivism in part begins. Consequently, the conceptual starting points are in part located in the good realized once the solution is applied and the problem resolved.

Christine Korsgaard offers a variant of this formulation by characterizing the concept of justice as a solution to a distribution problem concerning collectively created goods (C. Korsgaard 2003). A conception of justice is a particular solution to this problem; it should answer questions like: Who gets what? Who makes what? How much of what one makes should one get? Who is excluded from getting what others have made? A society can consistently answer these questions over time by referring to—implicitly or explicitly—principles of justice. These principles might assign rights or entitlements to individuals, or they might ensure fair and open access to the courts, or they might protect political voice. In each case they must express a particularly thick conception of political right by providing a fairly specific solution to the problem. For example, a conception of justice might express a libertarian set of principles, such as Nozick’s principles of acquisition and transfer; or it might express a liberal egalitarian principle, such as Rawls’ difference principle. On Korsgaard’s view, the task of practical philosophy is to move from abstract normative concepts, such as justice, to a particular normative conception, such as Rawls’s justice as fairness, “by constructing an account of the problem reflected in the concept that will point the way to a conception that solves the problem” (C. Korsgaard 2003, 116). Constructivism does this by conceiving normative concepts and principles as functional—they play a particular role in helping solve the various practical problems that arise in social life. In the absence of such problems, constructivism does not have a toehold from which to begin constructing principles of justice.

There are two important features of a practical formulation of constructivism. First, the resources for constructing principles are in part located in the practical problems humans face, or more precisely the good brought about when those problems are solved. Consequently, we must first look to the nature of the problem before we can understand why principles are obligatory and for what reasons they are authoritative. Second, “a sufficiently detailed and accurate description of the problem actually yields the solution” (C. Korsgaard 2003, 115). This is because the precepts of practical reason and conceptions of persons from which principles are constructed arise from within the problem itself. To see this, consider Korsgaard’s moral constructivism, which in its most recent formulation is primarily concerned with the problem of agency, or the question: How is it possible for a person to act autonomously and effectively over time? (C. M. Korsgaard 2009). Korsgaard begins with the observation that humans are free; it is an inescapable fact of life that we are free to choose and act. The process of acting freely is at the same time a process of constructing our identities over time. If we are to construct unified lives, we need both the freedom to act and a set of principles for determining the reasons on which we act. In the absence of freedom our choices would fail to be our own and we would cease being the authors of our lives. In the absence of principally determined action, our choices would be arbitrary and we would fail to create unified lives reflecting identity and integrity. The problem is to articulate a concept of freedom that is also law abiding. Korsgaard adopts Kant’s Categorical Imperative as the solution, since the categorical imperative tells us to act in such a way that the rule on which one acts can be adopted as a law by all rational persons. Insofar as the imperative recognizes the action as being caused by the person, it preserves freedom. Insofar as it requires the universalization of the rule on which the action is based, it preserves lawfulness. Indeed, Korsgaard thinks the Categorical Imperative principle is constitutive of autonomous, effective agency. That is, we simply cannot understand ourselves as autonomous, unified agents without also ascribing to ourselves this particular principle of practical reason. Consequently, a sufficiently detailed and accurate description of the problem of human agency actually yields the Categorical Imperative as a solution, or so Korsgaard argues.

Korsgaard is admittedly concerned with a constructivist account of practical reason rather than a constructivist account of justice or legitimacy. Whether such a constructivist project is plausible is beyond the scope of this article (see “Constructivism in Metaethics”). But what is important about Korsgaard’s constructivism is that it articulates a notably different structure of justification than the one expressed by procedural formulations. According to proceduralism, principles are justified when they result from a suitably framed procedure, similar to the way presidents become legitimate by running in fair and open elections. By contrast, Korsgaard justifies principles in terms of their function—they solve practical problems. Moreover, principles are objective when they uniquely solve the problem, that is, when there exists no competing principle that can also solve the problem. To illustrate the point, Korsgaard draws on Rawls’ Political Liberalism and the problem of liberalism. Rawls describe the problem of liberalism as follows: “[H]ow is it possible for there to exist over time a just and stable society of free and equal citizens, who remain profoundly divided by reasonable religious, philosophical, and moral doctrines?” (Rawls 1993, xx, xxvii, 4). Korsgaard thinks Rawls’ two principles solve this problem insofar as they describe what a liberal society must do in order to be liberal (C. Korsgaard 2003, 115). Consequently, Rawls’ conception of justice is justified; it functions so as to solve the problem of liberalism. However, Rawls’ conception of justice is not the only justified conception, since other liberal conceptions can also solve the problem. It follows that Rawls’s principles are justified but not objectively so, since they do not uniquely solve the problem. Consequently, rival conceptions of liberalism are equally defensible insofar as they function equally well. In order to construct a uniquely objective set of principles, one must abstract a common core from the several justified sets of principles. Rawls does something like this when he identifies three abstract principles characteristic of any liberal society. These include: (1) the specification of certain basic rights, liberties and opportunities; (2) an assignment of priority to those rights with respect to claims of the general good, and (3) some measure assuring to all citizens adequate all-purpose means to make effective use of their rights (Rawls 1993, 6). Although neither Rawls nor Korsgaard makes this argument, it is possible to think of this abstract core as an objective set of principles constitutive of liberalism, since one could hardly describe a liberal society without also presupposing them as governing principles.

Another way to frame Rawls’ Political Liberalism within a practical formulation of constructivism is in terms of the moral concerns implicit in the problem of liberalism. These concerns can serve as criteria for assessing whether principles solve the problem. Again, take Rawls’ problem of liberalism. It asks how it is possible for there to exist over time a just and stable society of free and equal citizens, who remain profoundly divided by reasonable religious, philosophical, and moral doctrines (Rawls 1993, xx, xxvii, 4). Notice that the problem attaches a set of concerns to a fact about society. The relevant fact is the fact of pluralism—in a liberal society citizens are profoundly divided by reasonable conceptions of a good life. The concern is social stability given this fact. The challenge is to find a set of principles that answer this concern. In addition to the fact and concern, the problem of liberalism expresses a conception of reasonableness. Citizens are reasonable when they are both (a) ready to propose fair terms of cooperation they reasonably believe those to whom they are offered can reasonably accept and (b) appreciate certain factors, or burdens of judgment, that render it impossible to fully reconcile disagreements over all matters of value, including some matters of justice (Rawls 1993, xliv, 58–59). Certain comprehensive doctrines—the stuff of pluralism—become reasonable when those holding them recognize the social implications of the burdens of judgment, and allow the effects of this recognition to take root in one’s “attitude (including toleration) toward other comprehensive doctrines” (Rawls 1993, 375).

With these building blocks in place, we can begin to see how the problem of liberalism points the way toward a solution. The problem expresses concerns and concepts that can be formulated as criteria for assessing principles of justice. For example, the criterion of reciprocity obliges citizens to defend their political positions with reasons they honestly believe those to whom they are offered might reasonably accept (Rawls 1993, xliv). It is implicit in the concern for stability among reasonable citizens profoundly divided by reasonable conceptions of a good life. Consequently, the problem of liberalism contains within it the resources for articulating the standards against which competing conceptions of justice can be assessed. If citizens find the formulation of the problem compelling, they will simultaneously agree on these standards, since these standards are already implicit in the formulation of the problem. Conceptions of justice meeting these standards are justified because they answer the concerns reflected in the problem and thus function so as to solve the problem.

This is a powerful form of political argument. Its essential point is that the epistemic standards for assessing rival conceptions of justice are internal to the problems we encounter in social life. Analyses of these problems can uncover the standards against which principles are justified. This creates a straightforward, instrumental assessment of political principles and the public policies based on them. Principles and policies are justified when they answer the concerns implicit in the problem. The moral authority of these principles and policies is felt by anyone recognizing the problem.

The practical interpretation of constructivism is not without its difficulties, since the justification of principles hinges on the description of the problem. It is not obviously the case that people will agree on the formulation of the problem. For example, if one accepts Rawls’ description of the problem of liberalism, then one is also committed to accepting some conception of liberal justice as binding on social practices. But one might not accept Rawls’ description of the problem and thus fail to see how the principles solving Rawls’ problem are binding on his or her actions. Consequently, the practical interpretation of constructivism shifts the question of justification onto the descriptions of problems. This mirrors the way in which a proceduralist formulation shifts the question of justification onto the account of procedures. In each case, the justification of principles first requires a defense of something else, the procedure or the problem.

Korsgaard and Rawls represent different directions for addressing this difficulty. Korsgaard hopes to ground the description of agency on generally weak and widely acceptable ideas about freedom and unity. By contrast, Rawls localizes the description of the problem to a particular domain of political concern. These two directions mirror the two directions taken by those developing a procedural formulation of constructivism. In both cases the idea is to offer a better defense of the fundamental elements from which principles are constructed, for in the absence of such a defense the principles themselves will lack justificatory force.

6. Conclusion

In his Reconstruction and Critique of A Theory of Justice, Robert Paul Wolff suggests that the problem with which Rawls begins is not the impasse in our recent political history concerning the conflict between freedom and equality, but rather “the impasse in Anglo-American ethical theory at about the beginning of the 1950’s” (Wolff 1977, 11). This latter impasse concerns the debate between utilitarianism and intuitionism during the first half of the twentieth century. Wolff interprets Rawls as trying to advance normative political theory beyond this impasse by drawing on each position’s respective strengths without succumbing to their fatal flaws. The strength of utilitarianism is its straightforward assertion of human happiness as the metric by which moral right is measured. It offers a clear, plausible, and constructive criterion for settling moral disputes on reasons all can understand. Its fatal flaw, however, is that the metric itself—overall human happiness—can also serve as a reason for violating the individual autonomy and freedom of persons. Intuitionism avoids this fatal flaw by flatly asserting the inviolability of human autonomy and freedom, thus protecting individuals against those who might sacrifice human rights in order to achieve a greater good. Its fatal flaw, however, is that it offers no reason for treating autonomy and freedom as inviolable, and thus fails to explain why these features of human dignity place moral constraints on actions that might otherwise produce some valuable end.

Wolff interprets Rawls as sketching a way out of this impasse by developing an account of practical reason that grounds the metric of moral assessment on reasons all can understand. For “without rational grounds for choosing one system of ends or goals rather than another… we would be forced to retreat to the subjectivity of prudence, as utilitarianism, for all its efforts to the contrary, ultimately does; or else we would, in desperation, simply have to posit substantive objective moral principles without a suggestion of rational argument, as does intuitionism” (Wolff 1977, 20).

The impasse Wolff describes is indeed the impasse constructivism tries to break. In each of the variants described above, the aim is to provide a method of analysis by which a set of principles can be justified. This is accomplished by defending—or making plausible—the use of certain fundamental elements in the construction of a favored set of principles. Moreover, the analysis should be as clear and as easy to follow as a utilitarian analysis. Indeed, it is in the clarity of the analysis that constructivism’s greatest impact ultimately rests, since the clarity of the analysis represents a compelling form of political argument. What constructivism is ultimately concerned with is the nature of normative political argument and each variant described above can be interpreted as an effort to find a compelling form of political argument that can justify normative political principles. In short, it seeks a methodology of substantive justification (James 2013, 251). The various political principles constraining public policy are the result of this methodology. Or, to put the same point the other way around, the method of political analysis constructs the principles. Apart from these constructions, there are no moral facts or true political judgments, nor are there ways of assessing the moral appropriateness of political action. It is only when deliberations are properly constrained by a particular methodology that the resulting product is a principle against which our policies can be assessed as right or wrong. If the methodology or form of political argument is compelling, then a basis for settling fundamental political questions can be established on reasons all can understand. Although such a basis cannot guarantee agreement, it should at least narrow our political debates by cementing the point at which disagreements arise, bringing out into the light of day the reasons why people arrive at political judgments that are not only different but are sometimes incommensurable. Consequently, the holy grail of political constructivism is not a set of principles we can all agree upon, but rather a method of normative political analysis so compelling that no clear headed person can plausibly deny without also appearing entirely tone deaf to the kinds of concerns peculiar to political life. Such a method would enable society to deal with its political problems in a constructive manner by systematically building upon previous successes in an ongoing struggle to make the public domain as just as it can possibly be.

7. References and Further Reading

Barry, Brian. 1991. Theories of Justice. University of California Press.
Barry, Brian. 1995. “John Rawls and the Search for Stability.” Ethics 105 (4): 874–915.
Cohen, G. A. 2008. Rescuing Justice and Equality. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
Daniels, Norman. 1996. Justice and Justification: Reflective Equilibrium in Theory and Practice. Cambridge University Press.
Darwall, Stephen, Allan Gibbard, and Peter Railton. 1992. “Toward Fin de Siècle Ethics: Some Trends.” The Philosophical Review 101 (1): 115–89. doi:10.2307/2185045.
Dworkin, Ronald. 1973. “The Original Position.” The University of Chicago Law Review 40 (3): 500–533. doi:10.2307/1599246.
Hare, R. M. 1973. “Rawls’ Theory of Justice—I.” The Philosophical Quarterly 23 (91): 144–55. doi:10.2307/2217486.
James, Aaron. 2012. Fairness in Practice: A Social Contract for a Global Economy. Oxford University Press.
James, Aaron. 2013. “Political Constructivism.” In A Companion to Rawls, J. Mandel and D.A. Reidy, 251–64. John Wiley & Sons.
Klosko, George. 1993. “Rawls’s ‘Political’ Philosophy and American Democracy.” American Political Science Review 87 (02): 348–59. doi:10.2307/2939045.
Korsgaard, C. 2003. “Realism and Constructivism in Twentieth-Century Moral Philosophy.” Journal of Philosophical Research 28: 99–122.
Korsgaard, Christine M. 2009. Self-Constitution: Agency, Identity, and Integrity. Oxford; New York: Oxford University Press.
Lenman, James and Yonatan Shemmer, eds. 2012. Constructivism in Practical Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Nagel, Thomas. 1973. “Rawls on Justice.” The Philosophical Review 82 (2): 220–34. doi:10.2307/2183770.
O’Neill, Onora. 1988. “The Presidential Address: Constructivisms in Ethics.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 89: 1–17.
O’Neill, Onora. 1996. Towards Justice and Virtue: A Constructive Account of Practical Reasoning. Cambridge; New York: Cambridge University Press.
O’Neill, Onora. 2003. “Constructivism in Rawls and Kant.” Edited by Freeman, Samuel. The Cambridge Companion to Rawls, 347–67.
Rawls, John. 1993. Political Liberalism. Columbia University Press.
Rawls, John. 1999a. A Theory of Justice, Revised Edition. Harvard University Press.
Rawls, John. 1999b. Collected Papers. Harvard University Press.
Rawls, John. 2001. The Law of Peoples: With “The Idea of Public Reason Revisited.” Harvard University Press.
Roberts, Peri. 2007. Political Constructivism. Routledge.
Sandel, Michael J. 1998. Liberalism and the Limits of Justice. 2nd ed. Cambridge University Press.
Street, S. 2010. “What Is Constructivism in Ethics and Metaethics?” Philosophy Compass 5 (5): 363–84.
Valentini, Laura. 2011. “Global Justice and Practice-Dependence: Conventionalism, Institutionalism, Functionalism.” Journal of Political Philosophy 19 (4): 399–418. doi:10.1111/j.1467-9760.2010.00373.x.
Wolff, Robert Paul. 1977. Understanding Rawls: A Reconstruction and Critique of A Theory of Justice. First Edition edition. Princeton, N.J: Princeton University Press.

Author Information

Michael Buckley
Email: michael.buckley@lehman.cuny.edu
City University of New York
U. S. A.

The Ethics of Economic Sanctions

Economic sanctions involve the politically motivated withdrawal of customary trade or financial relations from a state, organisation or individual. They may be imposed by the United Nations, regional governmental organisations such as the European Union, or by states acting alone.

Although economic sanctions have long been a feature of international relations, the end of the Cold War in the late 20^th century saw significant proliferation of their use. The sanctions made concerted international action possible where previously any action by the West was countered by the U.S.S.R. and vice-versa.This meant that for the first time the United Nations Security Council could impose economic sanctions that, in theory at least, all member states were required to take part in. With this came the possibility to inflict serious damage. Most notable during this period were the comprehensive sanctions imposed on Haiti, the former Yugoslav republics and Iraq. The harms caused to Haiti and the former Yugoslav republics were severe, but the harms suffered by Iraq were the worst ever caused by the use of economic sanctions outside of a war situation. UNICEF, for example, estimated that the economic sanctions imposed on Iraq led to the deaths of 500,000 children aged under five from malnutrition and disease.

Following the devastation caused by economic sanctions in Iraq, a wide variety of organisations began to seriously investigate the possibility of alternative forms of economic sanctions, sanctions not targeted against ‘ordinary people’ but rather targeted against those considered to be morally responsible for the objectionable policies of the target state. The results—‘targeted’ economic sanctions—became the UN’s economic sanctions tool of choice throughout the 2000s. Targeted economic sanctions include measures such as freezing the assets of top government officials or those suspected of financing terrorism, arms embargoes, nuclear sanctions and so on. The harms inflicted by targeted sanctions are, for the most part, much less extensive than those inflicted by previous episodes of economic sanctions which targeted entire populations. Nevertheless, they are not harmless and may still be morally problematic. For example, the arms embargo imposed during the break up of the former Yugoslavia was widely criticised as it did not permit the Bosnian Muslims to acquire the weapons they needed to defend themselves from the genocidal attacks of certain Bosnian-Serb forces.

Despite the obvious and serious moral problems associated with economic sanctions, the ethics of economic sanctions is a topic that has been curiously neglected by philosophers and political theorists. Only a handful of philosophical journal articles and book chapters have ever been published on the subject. This article describes the work that has been carried out.

The Nature of Economic Sanctions
The Ethics of Economic Sanctions
References and Further Reading

1. The Nature of Economic Sanctions

a. Definition

Economic sanctions are the deliberate withdrawal of customary trade or financial relations (Hufbauer et al., 2007), ordered by a state, supra-national or international governmental organisation (the ‘sender’) from any state, sub-state group, organisation or individual (the ‘target’) in response to the political behaviour of that target.

The specific elements of this definition merit some discussion. First, economic sanctions may comprise the withdrawal of customary trade or financial relations in whole or in part. Trade may be restricted in its entirety by refusing all imports and exports. If all imports and exports are refused then the sanctions are known as ‘comprehensive’ sanctions. (Though note that even in the case of comprehensive sanctions humanitarian exemptions are usually made, for example, for food and medicine). In other cases, only some imports or exports are refused—usually commodities like oil and timber—or weapons in the case of arms embargoes. Financial restrictions include measures such as asset freezes, the denial of credit, the denial of banking services, the withdrawal of aid and so on. Again, withdrawal of financial relations may be comprehensive or not.

Second, economic sanctions may be ordered (or ‘imposed’) by a variety of actors. Sanctions can be ‘multilateral’, ordered by the United Nations or regional organisations such as the European Union, or they can be ‘unilateral’, ordered by one state acting alone. The actor ordering economic sanctions is typically known as the ‘sender’ of the sanctions.

In practical terms, contemporary economic sanctions are imposed by following a legal process. For example, economic sanctions mandated by the United Nations Security Council are required to be adopted by all member states under chapter VII of the United Nations Charter. States then pass legislation prohibiting their citizens from entering into trading and/or financial relationships with the target and setting penalties for sanctions-breaking. So although we often talk of sanctions being ‘imposed’ on the target, it should be clear that economic sanctions are actually legal measures imposed by a sender on its own members. It is a sender’s own citizens who are prohibited from trading.

Further, note that this definition excludes measures undertaken by non-state actors, for example, consumer boycotts or boycotts undertaken by companies or religious organisations. Such measures are undeniably worthy of ethical enquiry; however, the ethical concerns they present are sufficiently distinctive to make it sensible to treat them as a separate issue.

Third, states are not the only targets of economic sanctions. Economic sanctions can be, and often are, imposed on sub-state groups. Well known examples from the recent past are the sanctions imposed on Serb-controlled areas of the former Yugoslavia in the 1990s or the ban on trade in conflict diamonds that targeted sub-state rebel groups in parts of Africa. Economic sanctions can also be imposed on companies, organisations and individuals. For example, the UK regularly freezes the UK-held assets of companies, charities or individuals suspected of funding terrorist activities. For this reason it is perfectly possible for a state to sanction its own citizens. Those on the receiving end of economic sanctions are typically known as the ‘target’.

In recent years there has been a shift away from targeting entire states, and towards targeting economic sanctions more narrowly at specific sub-state groups and individuals—those considered responsible for the political behaviour the sanctions are responding to. The reasons for this are two-fold. First, it is expected that such sanctions are more likely to achieve their objectives. Second, it makes it less likely that the harms of sanctions will fall on innocent people. Economic sanctions that are narrowly targeted in this way are known as ‘targeted’ or ‘smart’ sanctions. There is no common term for sanctions imposed on an entire state. This entry suggests ‘collective’.

Fourth, under this definition, economic sanctions are imposed in response to the political behaviour of the target—as distinguished from its economic behaviour. Such a stipulation is common in the economic sanctions literature. For example, Robert Pape distinguishes economic sanctions from what he calls ‘trade wars’:

When the United States threatens China with economic punishment if it does not respect human rights, that is an economic sanction; when punishment is threatened over copyright infringement, that is a trade war (Pape, 1999, 94).

However, not everyone accepts this distinction. David Baldwin, for instance, denies that economic sanctions must be a response to political behaviour. For Baldwin economic sanctions can be a response to any type of behaviour—there is no reason to restrict the definition of economic sanctions to those measures which aim to respond to political behaviour. Thus, contra Pape, Baldwin argues that if the U.S imposes restrictions on trade with China over copyright issues then this is an economic sanction. Further, he argues that in any case there is no clear-cut distinction between the ‘political’ and the ‘economic’ and so there would be no clear-cut basis for making the distinction even if it were warranted (Baldwin, 1985).

In response to Baldwin, it is worth pointing out that in common usage the term ‘economic sanctions’ is actually reserved for a distinctive class of cases that we can roughly describe as being a response to political rather than economic behaviour. Baldwin is right that there is no clear-cut distinction between the political and the economic, but to categorise responses to both as economic sanctions is to ignore the fact that people do actually manage to make the distinction in practice.

Finally, the definition presented here makes no reference to the objective sought by economic sanctions or the mechanism by which they are expected to work. This is an advantage since both the question of the proper objectives of sanctions and the question of how they work, are controversial.

b. Objectives

Economic sanctions theorists tend to conceptualise economic sanctions in one of two ways: as tools of foreign policy or as tools of international law enforcement. As tools of foreign policy, their objective is to achieve foreign policy goals. As tools of international law enforcement, their objective is to enforce international law or international moral norms.

i. Achievement of Foreign Policy Goals

Economic sanctions are most commonly conceptualised as being tools for achieving foreign policy goals. They are considered part of the foreign policy ‘toolkit’ (a range of measures that includes diplomacy, propaganda, covert action, the use of military force, and so forth) that politicians have at their disposal when attempting to influence the behaviour of other states. The foreign policy conception comes in both simple and more sophisticated versions.

In the simple version, the objective of economic sanctions is to change or prevent a target’s ‘objectionable’ policy or behaviour where a policy or behaviour is understood to be ‘objectionable’ if it conflicts with the foreign policy goals of the sender.

However, a frequent criticism of economic sanctions is that—if these are their goals—then economic sanctions don’t work. That is, they usually fail to change or prevent a target’s objectionable policy or behaviour (Nossal, 1989). This concern has led some to ask the question: if economic sanctions don’t work, why do we keep using them? The attempt to answer this question has led some theorists to develop more sophisticated conceptions of economic sanctions.

It has been argued, for instance, that although changing a target’s ‘objectionable’ policy or behaviour is sometimes the objective of economic sanctions, politicians often employ economic sanctions in much more nuanced and subtle ways (Baldwin, 1985, Cortright & Lopez, 2000).

First, Baldwin argues that economic sanctions are often employed with the more limited objective of influencing a target’s ‘beliefs, attitudes, opinions, expectations, emotions and/or propensities to act’ (Baldwin, 1985, 20). No immediate policy or behaviour change is expected—even if, in the long—term, some change is hoped for. In such cases Baldwin argues that economic sanctions are being used symbolically to ‘send a message’. They can signal specific intentions or general foreign policy orientations or they can be used to show support or disapproval for the policies of other states. If the economic sanctions are imposed at some cost to the sending state then this demonstrates the sender’s commitment to its position and strengthens the message being sent. Importantly, even if the objective of an episode of economic sanctions is to ‘send a message’, it is unlikely to feature as the officially stated objective. The message is stronger if the sanctions are framed as demanding a change in the target’s objectionable policy or behaviour—even if it is clear that the economic sanctions alone cannot hope to change this behaviour.

Second, Baldwin argues that economic sanctions may have multiple objectives of which some will be more important to the sender than others. Behaviour change might be a sender’s secondary or even tertiary objective whilst ‘sending a message’ might be the primary objective. Even if the most important objective for the sender is to ‘send a message’, the economic sanctions must be framed as demanding behaviour change if this secondary or tertiary objective is to be met.

Third, economic sanctions may have multiple targets. For example, if economic sanctions are employed as a general deterrent, then there will be many targets of the influence attempt extending well beyond the original recipient of the economic sanctions (Baldwin, 1985).

David Cortright and George A. Lopez have also worked on developing more sophisticated understandings of economic sanctions. Economic sanctions, they argue, can be imposed for purposes that include deterrence, demonstrating resolve, upholding international norms and sending messages of disapproval as well as influencing behaviour change (Cortright & Lopez, 2000).

Finally, Kim Richard Nossal argues that senders might also have retributive punishment as their objective. In other words the intent is to inflict economic harm on a target they regard to have wronged them solely for its own sake and not to achieve any change in behaviour or policy. For Nossal, to be clear, saying a sender has been ‘wronged’ is not to say it has been morally wronged. It is only to say that the target’s actions have displeased the sender. Thus, on Nossal’s account, senders can ‘punish’ agents who—objectively—have done nothing morally wrong—just as a mafia boss might ‘punish’ underlings who have been passing information to the police. Again, it is important to realise that even if the purpose of the economic sanctions is retributive punishment, it is unlikely to be stated as such by the sender for fear of appearing irrational or vindictive (Nossal, 1989).

For all these reasons it would be a mistake to assume from the fact that economic sanctions often fail to achieve their stated objectives that economic sanctions do not work; stated objectives are not always true objectives. The true objectives might be to punish or to send a message. Even when the stated objectives are true objectives they may not be the primary objectives.

Given the above discussion, it appears that changing or preventing objectionable policies or behaviour, ‘sending a message’, and punishment are all possible objectives of economic sanctions.

ii. International Law Enforcement

Alternatively, economic sanctions are sometimes conceptualised as being a tool for enforcing international law or international norms of behaviour. On this conception, the ultimate objective of economic sanctions is understood to be international law enforcement.

For Margaret Doxey, enforcement of the law through the use of economic sanctions might take several forms.

First, enforcement might involve the ending of ongoing violations of international law/norms—the domestic analogy is that of stopping a crime in progress. Doxey’s own example is that of economic sanctions imposed to reverse the illegal invasion of the Falklands Islands by Argentina (Doxey, 1987, 91).

Second, enforcement might require preventing violations of international law from occurring in the first place. The domestic equivalent is that of preventing a known criminal conspiracy from being realised. As Doxey notes, under chapter VII of the UN Charter, given adequate support from its members, the Security Council can designate any situation a threat to peace and then order preventive action to ensure that the threat is not realised (Doxey, 1987, 91).

Third, enforcement might require that economic sanctions are imposed punitively subsequent to violations of international law to deter either the recipient state or others from repeating the violations. Here economic sanctions are ‘a kind of fine for international misbehaviour’ (Doxey, 1987, 92).

The main difference between the law enforcement and the foreign policy conceptions of economic sanctions is that the former claims that the objectives of economic sanctions are purely to enforce international law/international norms of behaviour, whereas the latter claims that the objectives of economic sanctions are determined by a sender’s foreign policy. Of course the two conceptions are not mutually exclusive. A given sanctions episode may align with a sender’s foreign policy goals and work to enforce international law.

This difference between the two conceptions can partially be explained with reference to the focus of the respective theorists’ studies: those employing a foreign policy conception tend to focus on cases where states are the senders of economic sanctions, whereas those employing a law enforcement conception tend to focus on cases where the UN is the sender. Undoubtedly the foreign policy conception fits states better than the UN and the law enforcement conception fits the UN better than states. However, it would be wrong to say that the foreign policy conception applies to states and the law enforcement conception to the UN. States can also act to enforce international law. Likewise, the UN is not immune to the national interests of its more powerful member states.

To summarise then, these are the possible objectives of economic sanctions:

To change or prevent objectionable or unlawful policies or behaviour
To send a message with regards to objectionable or unlawful policies or behaviour
To punish objectionable or unlawful behaviour on deterrent or retributive grounds

c. Mechanisms

Whatever the objectives of economic sanctions, we also need to address the question of how economic sanctions work. Five mechanisms are discussed here: economic pressure, non-economic pressure, direct denial of resources, message sending and punitive mechanisms.

i. Economic Pressure

Theorists of economic sanctions began addressing the question of how economic sanctions worked in the 1970s and 80s and took as their model collective sanctions imposed on states—as this was the predominant mode of sanctioning at the time. They theorised that economic sanctions achieved behaviour/policy change via the imposition of economic pressure. Robert Pape sums this view up well when he states that economic sanctions ‘seek to lower the aggregate economic welfare of a target state by reducing international trade in order to coerce the target government to change its political behaviour’ (Pape, 1997, 94). In elaborating on this mechanism Pape argues that:

Targets of economic sanctions understand they would be better off economically if they conceded to the coercer’s demands, and make their decision based on whether they consider their political objectives to be worth the economic costs. (Pape, 1997, 94)

A similar view to Pape is shared by Hufbauer. They use the following framework to analyse the utility of economic sanctions:

Stripped to the bare bones, the formula for a successful sanctions effort is simple: The costs of defiance borne by the target must be greater than its perceived cost of compliance. That is, the political and economic costs to the target from sanctions must be greater than the political and security costs of complying with the sender’s demands. (Hufbuaer, 2007, 50)

Indeed, the view that economic sanctions work via the imposition of economic pressure is the most widely accepted in the literature. Johann Galtung even calls it ‘the general theory of economic sanctions’ and he elucidates as follows. Focussing on collective economic sanctions, Galtung argues that the objective of economic sanctions is to cause an amount of economic harm sufficient to bring about the ‘political disintegration’ of the state which, in turn, will result in the state being forced to comply with the sender’s demands. For Galtung ‘political disintegration’ is a split in the leadership of a state or a split between the leadership and the people that occurs as people within the state disagree about what to do with regards to the sanctions and the resulting economic crisis. This may involve popular protest and the government being forced to change the objectionable or unlawful policy for fear of losing power. Under what Galtung calls the ‘naïve theory’ of economic sanctions (which he rejects), the more severe the economic pressure, the faster and more significant the political disintegration and the sooner the state will comply. This theory is naïve, Galtung argues, because it does not take into account the fact that sanctions might—at least initially—result in political integration, as the people of the state pull together in the face of adversity. This is especially likely to occur if the target government can muster up the spirit of nationalism. Indeed, ‘rally-round-the-flag’ effects are often cited as a reason for the failure of economic sanctions. Under Galtung’s ‘revised theory’ of economic sanctions, economic pressure results initially in political integration but will eventually lead to political disintegration as economic pressure increases but, he warns, the levels of economic harm required for this might in some cases be exceptionally severe (Galtung, 1967).

With regards to targeted sanctions, it seems possible that they could also sometimes operate via an economic pressure mechanism. For example, asset freezes on top government officials might pressure them into changing the objectionable or unlawful policy/behaviour if the amounts involved were significant enough.

ii. Non-Economic Pressure

Baldwin, however, argues that although economic pressure is one possibility for how economic sanctions might work, it is not the only one. In particular, he argues that economic sanctions do not have to cause economic harm to work. He argues that even if the economic sanctions make barely a dent in a target state’s economy, its government may be moved to act out of a concern to avoid international embarrassment or a reputation as a pariah state. This is particularly likely to occur when targets believe themselves to be members in good standing of international society. Suffering international condemnation might be unacceptable to them. In other cases Baldwin argues that targets might worry that the economic sanctions are a prelude to war. Since a just war must be a last resort, those about to resort to war often impose sanctions first—either in a genuine attempt to reach a non-military resolution or, more cynically, to demonstrate to domestic and international audiences that non-military methods have been attempted and failed—thus making war the last resort. A target might comply with the economic sanctions not because they damage the economy but out of concern to avoid war (Baldwin, 1985). The pressure employed here does not derive from the economic effects of the sanctions. Both collective and targeted economic sanctions may utilise a non-economic pressure mechanism.

iii. Direct Denial of Resources

Economic sanctions employing either the economic or non-economic pressure mechanisms work only indirectly: pressure is applied to targets to force them to change their objectionable/unlawful policies themselves. Thus such sanctions are sometimes referred to as ‘indirect’ sanctions (Gordon, 1999).

However, economic sanctions can also operate directly by denying a target the resources necessary for pursuit of their objectionable/unlawful policy. For example, if the objectionable/unlawful policy of that target state is its militarisation, then economic sanctions might be designed to damage a target state’s economy so thoroughly that it does not have the resources available to build up or maintain its military capacity, or they might involve arms embargoes or nuclear sanctions. Similarly, asset freezes of either state funds or the funds of government officials may operate with a direct mechanism. Freezing Libya’s state funds and the funds of Colonel Gadaffi was intended to make it impossible for him to pay mercenaries during the Arab Spring. Plus the freezing of assets suspected of belonging to terrorist groups is intended to make financing terrorist operations more difficult. Such ‘direct sanctions’ do not apply pressure to the target to change their objectionable/unlawful policy themselves but instead work directly by denying the target the resources it needs to pursue the objectionable/unlawful policy.

iv. Message Sending

Of course, not all economic sanctions aim to change or prevent an objectionable/unlawful policy. Some aim only to ‘send a message’. If the objective of the economic sanctions is simply to ‘send a message’ then the imposition of sanctions in itself should be sufficient to achieve this—causing economic harm should not be necessary. Having said this, there are undoubtedly ways of making the message stronger and causing some economic harm to the target might do this. Of course, as both Baldwin and Doxey note, this is not the only way to strengthen the message. If the sanctions are costly to the sender—because, for instance, they involve putting a stop to valuable exports, this willingness of the sender to bear costs shows how seriously it takes the situation.

v. Punitive Mechanisms

Punishment necessarily involves the infliction of some harm, suffering or otherwise unpleasant consequences on the target, and this is the case whether the objective of the punishment is to deter or whether the punishment is purely retributive in nature. Thus economic sanctions imposed as punishment must either inflict some economic harm or, if a target state (or organisation/individual) is particularly sensitive about its standing in the international community, symbolic sanctions expressing international condemnation might suffice as punishment.

d. Summary

The table below summarises the possible objectives of economic sanctions, together with each objective’s related mechanism(s).

2. The Ethics of Economic Sanctions

At least four moral frameworks have been used to consider the ethics of economic sanctions: just war theory, theories of law enforcement, utilitarianism, and ‘clean hands’.

a. Just War Theory

Of the few writers who have considered the ethics of economic sanctions, the majority point to the analogies between economic sanctions and war and use just war theory as a framework within which to assess their moral permissibility. Some extend the framework only to collective, comprehensive economic sanctions (Gordon, 1999) while others extend it to all types of economic sanctions (Pierce, 1996, Winkler, 1999, Amstutz, 2013).

Just war theory is split into two parts: jus ad bellum, which sets out the principles that must be followed for the resort to war to be just and jus in bello, which sets out the principles that must be followed during war. (Some just war theorists add a third part, jus post bellum, which sets out the principles that must be followed post-war, but since no writers on economic sanctions consider jus post bellum, it has been left out of the following analysis). Those writers who employ just war theory as a moral framework believe that these principles of just war theory can—with minor adjustments—be appropriate as a moral framework for economic sanctions as follows.

There are six principles of jus ad bellum. For the resort to war to be just, all six conditions must be met.

Just Cause: There must be a just cause for war. In mainstream just war theory, just cause is limited to:

the defence of a state from an actual or imminent military attack; and
humanitarian intervention in cases where a state is committing extremely serious human rights violations against its own citizens.

Theorists applying this principle to economic sanctions widely agree that there is just cause to impose economic sanctions if their aim is:

to defend a state from the target’s actual or imminent military attack; or
to stop extremely serious human rights violations being carried out by the target against its own citizens.

Some theorists go further and allow greater latitude for the case of economic sanctions, arguing that there is just cause for economic sanctions in situations of serious injustice that nevertheless fall short of just cause for war (Amstutz, 2013).

However, under the just war framework, there is no just cause for economic sanctions with punitive objectives. Likewise, there is no just cause for economic sanctions imposed preventively, to head off future (but non-imminent) attacks. The theorists in question do not consider economic sanctions designed to ‘send a message’, but since such sanctions do not aim to defend a state from military attack or to stop serious human rights violations but aim merely to change attitudes, beliefs, and so forth, it would seem that there would be no just cause for them on this approach. Therefore, economic sanctions designed to punish or to prevent objectionable/unlawful policies or behaviour would be ruled out as would all sanctions designed to ‘send a message’.

Proportionality: The harm that will foreseeably be caused by the war must not be disproportionate to the good that it is hoped will be achieved. The good consequences to be counted are limited to those specified in the just cause, i.e. putting a stop to any attack or human rights abuses. Any incidental good consequences, such as the kick-starting of an economy, should not be included in the proportionality calculation. However, the harmful consequences of war are not limited to certain types and should all be counted. Further, the calculation must include the harms suffered by all parties to the war and those suffered by neutral states.

For economic sanctions, this principle is met if the good achieved by the sanctions is expected to outweigh the harms of those sanctions. The good to be counted is the ending of the attack, human rights abuses or other injustice. The harms to be counted include not just those suffered by target citizens but also those suffered by sender citizens. It is worth remembering that citizens of sender states can suffer—either directly if their business relies on trade with the target—or indirectly if the economy of the sending state is particularly reliant on trade with the target.

There is nothing essential to the nature of economic sanctions that would prevent the proportionality condition being met.

Right Intention: The decision to go to war must be made with the right intention—the intention to achieve the just cause. The just cause must not be a pretext for some unjust end that is secretly intended. Therefore, economic sanctions must be imposed with the intention of defending a state from attack or stopping/reducing human rights violations. There is nothing essential to the nature of economic sanctions that prevents this condition from being fulfilled. However, Winkler warns that, as a matter of fact, there is a propensity for economic sanctions to be imposed without clear purpose and this means that the requirement of right intention might not be met in many actual cases (Winkler, 1999).

Legitimate Authority: The decision to go to war must be made by a legitimate authority. That is, one which has the moral right to act on behalf of its people and take them into a war. In international law there is a presumption that the governments of all states are legitimate authorities. According to mainstream just war theory, private individuals may not wage war. According to A. J. Coates, war is a legal instrument, and the power to enforce the law is vested in the government on behalf the political community. Thus, private war is an instance of taking the law into your own hands and is a kind of vigilante justice (Coates, 1997).

There is nothing essential to the nature of economic sanctions that would prevent this condition being met. However, if we take the war/economic sanctions analogy seriously, the legitimate authority condition implies that private boycotts of a target state’s products by individuals, companies or other organisations are wrongful—a kind of vigilante justice. This is a conclusion that many would be unwilling to accept.

Last Resort: War must be the last resort. Given the horrendous harms it creates, war must be necessary in order to be just. If other, less harmful, alternatives are available such as economic sanctions or diplomatic measures, then war is not necessary and therefore not just. Under just war theory it is not the case that all the alternative measures must actually be attempted first: if it is obvious they would not work then there is no requirement to make such attempts.

Clearly, if war must be the last resort, it cannot be a requirement that economic sanctions are also a last resort. The equivalent requirement given is that economic sanctions must be the last resort short of war (Winkler, 1999, 145) or that less harmful or less coercive means must be attempted before economic sanctions may be imposed (Amstutz, 2013, 217 ). Again there is nothing essential to the nature of economic sanctions that would prevent them being the least harmful or coercive means available. However, it is worth noting that the harmful effects of economic sanctions have been underestimated in the past and it is not inconceivable that the harms of economic sanctions could exceed those of war in a given case.

Reasonable Chance of Success: There must be a reasonable chance of success. This is to prevent hopeless wars where people die pointlessly.

This condition is particularly pertinent for economic sanctions. Historically, economic sanctions have been accused of ‘never working’ (Nossal, 1989). If this were true then economic sanctions would never be morally permissible under just war theory. However, it is not true. The most comprehensive study of the effectiveness of economic sanctions to date concluded that economic sanctions succeeded (achieved their stated objectives) in one third of cases (Hufbauer et al., 2007). This figure is disputed and is not in any case particularly high. However, it seems fair to say it is not impossible for economic sanctions to work. Therefore this condition could be met in specific cases.

Having addressed the principles of jus ad bellum, it is clear that some economic sanctions may meet the conditions. However, it is still necessary to consider jus in bello. As with jus ad bellum, all the conditions of jus in bello must be met for an individual military action to be morally permissible. However, there is only one principle that is particularly relevant to economic sanctions and that is the principle of discrimination.

Discrimination: The principle of discrimination requires attackers to distinguish between two classes of people in war: combatants and non-combatants, and stipulates their different treatment. According to the principle of discrimination, it is morally permissible to attack combatants at any time. Non-combatants, on the other hand, have immunity from attack, and it is never morally permissible to attack them directly. However, it is sometimes morally permissible to harm non-combatants as an unintentional side effect of an attack against combatants or military property under the doctrine of double effect. The doctrine of double effect acknowledges that one action (for example, bombing a weapons factory) can have two effects: the intended effect (destroying a weapons factory) and a foreseen but unintended side effect (killing non-combatants who live nearby). According to the traditional doctrine of double effect, it is morally permissible to bring about a harmful side effect if it is a foreseen but genuinely unintended consequence of pursuing some good end that is intended—so long as the harm of the side effect is not disproportionate to the intended good end. Michael Walzer, however, significantly revises the traditional doctrine of double effect and it is worth considering his revision here because most of those writing on economic sanctions use Walzer’s version. Walzer adds a further condition to the doctrine. It is not good enough, Walzer argues, that the harm to non-combatants be unintended and not disproportionate, we should expect soldiers to take positive steps to minimise harm to non-combatants, even if this imposes costs to themselves. As he puts it ‘[d]ouble effect is defensible…only when the two [effects] are the product of a double intention: first, that the ‘good’ be achieved; second that the foreseeable evil be reduced as far as possible’ (Walzer, 2006, 155). It is only in this case when the side-effect harms to non-combatants are morally permissible.

In the case of economic sanctions though, who are the equivalent of ‘combatant’ and ‘non-combatant’? Pierce argues that the individuals falling into the class of ‘combatants’ are those who are actually part of the causal chain of events that led to the objectionable or unlawful policy: those who planned and organised it, and those who are carrying it out (Pierce, 1996, 102). Similarly, for Winkler, combatants are those who plan and carry out the objectionable or unlawful policy (Winkler, 1999, 149). For Amtutz, combatants are ‘the government and the elites that support it’ (Amstutz, 2013, 217). Gordon is not clear on who counts as a ‘combatant,’ but she is clear about who she thinks does not: ‘those who are least able to defend themselves, who present the least military threat, who have the least input into policy and military decisions, and who are the most vulnerable’ (Gordon, 1996, 125). On any of these definitions, it is clear that in cases where a target state is pursuing an objectionable/unlawful policy, there will be both ‘combatants’ and ‘non-combatants’ amongst its citizens.

It is generally agreed by writers employing the just war framework that collective sanctions violate the principle of discrimination. Where the collective sanctions involve an indirect economic pressure mechanism, economic harms are intentionally inflicted on the population in the hopes they will protest and force their government to change their objectionable policies. Given that some of the population will count as ‘non-combatants’, this involves the intentional infliction of harm on non-combatants and straightforwardly violates the principle of discrimination.

Where the collective sanctions involve a direct denial of resources mechanism, for example, an attempt to destroy an economy to end a state’s militarisation, the harm to non-combatants is not intended but it is foreseeable and it is still problematic. In the memorable words of Joy Gordon, such sanctions are like a ‘siege writ large’. The sanctions prevent the import of goods into a country just as a surrounding enemy army would a castle or city. Thus sanctions are vulnerable to the same moral criticisms as a siege. Sieges do not discriminate between combatants and non-combatants. In fact in a siege it is usually the non-combatants who suffer the most since increasingly scarce resources will be allocated as a matter of priority to the army or leadership. As Gordon states, in both sieges and in the case of comprehensive collective sanctions ‘the harm is done to those who are least able to defend themselves, who present the least military threat, who have the least input into policy or military decisions, and who are the most vulnerable’ (Gordon, 1999, 125). Sieges do not discriminate between combatants and non-combatants and they do not demonstrate an intention to minimise harms to non-combatants. Therefore, even if the harms are not intended, they cannot be justified under Walzer’s revised doctrine of double effect.

In summary, all writers employing the just war principles as a framework justify its use by drawing an analogy between economic sanctions and war. The just war framework then leads them to conclude that collective sanctions are always impermissible because they violate the just war principle of discrimination. Pierce, Winkler and Amstutz further extend the use of just war principles to targeted economic sanctions and conclude that targeted economic sanctions that do not harm ‘non-combatants’ may be morally permissible because it is at least theoretically possible that they can meet all the just war principles. This would appear to be a neat solution to the issue of the ethics of economic sanctions. However, there are objections to this approach.

i. Objections to the Use of Just War theory: Christiansen and Powers

Christiansen & Powers argue that there are significant differences between the case of war and the case of collective, comprehensive economic sanctions and therefore that the just war principles provide an inadequate framework for the moral analysis of such economic sanctions. In particular they argue that the principle of discrimination does not apply to the case of economic sanctions.

For them, the most important differences between war and economic sanctions are that (1) economic sanctions are imposed as an alternative to war, not as a form of war (sieges during a war being a form of war), and (2) economic sanctions—if carefully designed and monitored—cause less harm than war. They argue that the just war principles—in particular the principle of discrimination—exist to prevent military conflicts heading down the road to ‘total war’, a hellish situation where anything goes. They are an attempt to keep war within some kind of limited civilised control. However, they argue, the intent behind economic sanctions is to avoid war altogether, to stop us even starting upon the road to total war. This being so, there is no reason why the principles governing war—including the principle of discrimination—should also govern economic sanctions (Christiansen & Powers, 1996, 101-109).

Of course that still leaves open the question of what principles should govern economic sanctions, particularly when it concerns questions of inflicting harm on ‘non-combatants’ or, as they put it ‘innocent’ people. Christiansen & Powers argue that in certain cases it is permissible to harm innocent people by means of economic sanctions—even intentionally—so long as their basic rights are not violated. As they state:

“Another model for thinking about sanctions may be found in the distinction between basic rights and lesser rights and enjoyments. This may prove more useful than the just war principle of [discrimination] as a paradigm for economic sanctions. As long as the survival of the population is not put at risk and its health is not severely impaired, aspects of daily life might temporarily be degraded for the sake of restoring the [more basic] rights of others” (Christiansen & Powers, 1996, 107).

Christiansen and Powers go on to argue that there are two further differences between war and economic sanctions that also lend support to abolishing the principle of discrimination. They argue (1) that a population might consent to suffer economic sanctions in which case harming them would not violate their rights, and (2) that a population can in fact bear moral responsibility for the actions of its government, for example, by supporting or not opposing them, and so not qualify as ‘non-combatant’ or innocent. They argue that neither of these considerations are available in the case of war.

It is first worth pointing out that they are surely wrong about these considerations not being available in the case of war. A population suffering severe human rights violations such as ethnic cleansing or genocide might consent to military intervention to help protect them. Likewise, if we can hold a population morally responsible for the actions of their government because they supported them or did not oppose them, then we can do this whether economic sanctions or war are being considered. Nevertheless, their arguments that consent or moral responsibility on the part of the innocent population renders harm to that population morally permissible can be considered on their own merits. Let us consider each in turn.

If an individual genuinely consents to suffer harm then her rights are not violated since she has waived her right to not be harmed in this way. To give an example, it is often argued that the Black population of South Africa consented to the anti-Apartheid sanctions and that this justified the harms they suffered. The consent argument, of course, only applies where the innocent population does in fact consent. This is something that is very difficult to establish. Further, even if it can be shown that the majority of a population consent to the sanctions, it is unlikely that every last person will do so. Hence the consent justification is unlikely to justify all targeting of innocent people.

Christiansen & Powers further argue that we can consider a population morally responsible for its government’s policies if they support them or fail to oppose them—at least where the state in question is a democracy and opposition does not meet with serious penalties. In such cases, they argue, the population is not innocent and so it is morally permissible to target them directly with economic sanctions. They give the example of the White population of South Africa, arguing that the White population shared responsibility for the Apartheid policies of their government and therefore it was morally permissible to target them directly with economic sanctions. However, even if it is accepted that supporting or failing to oppose objectionable/unlawful policies renders one morally responsible and non-innocent, it is very unlikely that every last person in a state is actually supporting—or not opposing—the policies. There is almost always some opposition, however small. Further, one would not normally attribute moral responsibility for such actions to children. They remain innocent. Hence, even if we were to accept the idea that supporting—or even just failing to oppose—one’s government was sufficient for the attribution of moral responsibility—a state would still have some innocent members amongst its population.

Christiansen & Powers conclude by offering their own moral framework which, while clearly influenced by just war theory, has significant differences. The most significant difference is the absence of the principle of discrimination and two replacement principles as follows:

A Commitment to and Prospects for a Political Solution: Sanctions should be pursued as an alternative to war, not as another form of war. They must be part of an abiding commitment to and a feasible strategy for finding a political solution to the problem that justified the imposition of sanctions in the first place.

Humanitarian Proviso: Civilians should be immune from grave and irreversible harm from sanctions, though lesser harms may be imposed on the civilian population. Provision must be made to ensure that fundamental human rights, such as the right to food, medicine, and shelter, are not violated. (Christiansen & Powers, 1996, 114)

ii. Further Objections to the Use of Just War Theory

It has been argued that the revisions made to the just war principles—considered above—do not go far enough. The just war principles are derived from a set of complex and detailed arguments all planted firmly within the context of war. These arguments contain premises that, whilst they may hold true in the case of war, do not always hold true in the case of economic sanctions. Therefore, a much more thoroughgoing revision of just war principles is required if they are to be applied to the case of economic sanctions (Ellis, 2013).

Further, while there are differences between war and collective comprehensive economic sanctions, there are even greater differences between war and targeted economic sanctions. These also call into question the use of a just war framework (Ellis, 2013). For example, why should an arms embargo—which aims to prevent or mitigate a war—be considered under the same principles governing the resort to war or the fighting of it? There is no obvious reason why it should.

b. Theories of Law Enforcement

As we have seen, one way of conceptualising of the economic sanctions is as a tool of international law enforcement: a means to prevent, terminate or punish violations of international law or international moral norms. Therefore, it would seem natural to analyse the ethics of economic sanctions using a framework based on the ethics of law enforcement. Theorists who have done this (Damrosch 1994, Lang 2008) argue that the use of economic sanctions as a tool of law enforcement faces significant moral challenges as follows.

Legitimate Authority: Many argue that only a legitimate authority has the right to enforce the law. An authority is considered legitimate if she (or it) is morally justified in exercising that authority. Opinion is divided on what exactly makes an authority legitimate but two oft-cited necessary conditions are (1) the consent of those subject to the authority (either tacit or explicit), (2) impartiality on the part of the authority; that is, the authority should have no reason to favour the interests of one party over the interests of any other (Rodin, 2002, 176-177).

In the domestic case, it is widely accepted that states (at least democratic states) have the legitimate authority to enforce domestic law against citizens. Therefore agents of the state (police, judges, prison officers) have the legitimate authority to prevent, terminate and punish crime in a way that ordinary citizens do not. If ordinary citizens attempt to prevent, terminate and punish criminals themselves—without any state involvement—this is closer to vigilantism or revenge than law enforcement.

However, in the international case the picture is more complex. Although (at least democratic) states are regarded as having legitimate authority over their own citizens, they are not regarded as having legitimate authority over the citizens of foreign states or over foreign states themselves. First, they lack the consent of foreign citizens or states. Second, they lack impartiality since, in any international dispute, they are likely to prefer their own national interest over the interest of foreign states or citizens. This position on the legitimate authority of states is consistent with the fundamental principle of international law that all sovereign states are equal in the international system.

Different considerations apply when it comes to the United Nations. Is the United Nations a legitimate authority? The UN certainly does claim the authority to interpret international law and to enforce it—at least in the area of peace and security. According to the UN Charter, the Security Council has the authority to require that all UN member states impose economic sanctions on those states or individuals it deems a threat to peace and security. However, many would argue that this authority is illusory since the UN lacks the power to enforce its own judgments on matters of international law. This is because the UN relies on support of member states to achieve law enforcement, and this is not always forthcoming. Further, the permanent members of the Security Council can veto any action the UN proposes. Other critics would argue that whatever de facto authority the UN has, that authority is not legitimate; some question whether the UN really has the consent of member states, others question whether or not the UN, dominated as it is by the five permanent members of the Security Council, is really impartial.

This leads many to conclude that (1) there is no entity in the international system with the legitimate authority to enforce the law, and (2) therefore there is no possibility of morally justified law enforcement at the international level.

Principled Basis: In order to be morally justified on the basis of law enforcement, the sanctions must be a response to violations of genuine international law or international moral norms (Damrosch, 1994). This is not as straightforward as it sounds. International law is a very different matter to domestic law; there is considerable dispute about the moral norms that hold sway internationally and whether or not they even count as real laws. While economic sanctions imposed as a response to the rule against aggression or genocide would pass this test easily, other moral norms are more questionable; to borrow an example from Damrosch, is democratic governance an international moral norm?

Consistency: Law enforcement should be consistent—it is a fundamental principle of justice that like cases are treated alike. It is unfair if one state or individual is prevented from carrying out an activity or punished for it, when another is not (other things being equal). Yet, all our evidence to date shows that economic sanctions are not imposed consistently—they are not regularly and reliably imposed on those who violate international law or international moral norms. With regards to the UN, the national interests of the UN Security Council members are more a guide to the likelihood of sanctions being employed than the fact of a violation (Damrosch, 1994). The situation for states is no different. This should not be surprising, consistency in law enforcement is a product of impartiality and neither the UN nor states are impartial.

Harm to Innocents: Economic sanctions that are used to prevent, terminate or punish breaches of international law sometimes intentionally (or at least foreseeably) harm innocent people—those who bear no moral responsibility for the illegality in question. This is morally problematic because, as a matter of justice, we usually think that the harms of law enforcement and punishment should be directed only at wrongdoers (Lang, 2008; Damrosch, 1994).

Here though it is worth making a distinction between punishment after the fact and law enforcement directed at preventing or terminating violations of law.

In the case of punishment after the fact, it is straightforwardly accepted by most that it is wrong to punish the innocent. This means that collective sanctions—those aimed at the entire population of a state—are straightforwardly morally wrong if judged as punishment. They are a type of collective punishment that punishes the innocent along with the guilty. Targeted sanctions, of course, may be targeted directly at the guilty (or at least those believed to be guilty) and so can avoid this problem.

Lang would extend the prohibition on harming the innocent to all types of law enforcement. However, Damrosch argues that the case of preventing and terminating violations of law is different. She argues that if the law being enforced is important enough (for example, if the sanctions are aimed at preventing genocide) then innocents may be intentionally or foreseeably harmed to achieve this. To be sure, law enforcement measures should be chosen carefully to minimise the suffering of innocent bystanders, but it should not be ruled out altogether (Damrosch, 1994, 67).

c. Utilitarianism

Joy Gordon has used utilitarianism to assess the moral status of comprehensive economic sanctions (Gordon, 1999). According to utilitarianism, an act is right if and only if it maximises utility (i.e. the balance of pleasure over pain or, more generally, of benefit over harm).

According to Gordon, comprehensive economic sanctions are justified on utilitarian grounds in cases where ‘the economic hardship of the civilian population of the target country entails less human harm overall, and less harm to the sanctioned population, than the military aggression or human rights violations the sanctions seek to prevent’ (Gordon, 1999, 133). Let us consider this idea in a bit more detail.

Imagine a sender is indeed considering imposing economic sanctions on a state that is engaged in military aggression or human rights violations. According to utilitarianism, the sender would be permitted (indeed, required) to impose economic sanctions if the sanctions were expected to result in less harm overall than any other means of ending the aggression/human rights violations (travel bans, military intervention and so forth) or, indeed, “doing nothing” and letting the aggression/violations continue unchecked. Note that in making this utilitarian calculation, harms to sender citizens, target citizens and all other individuals affected are to be counted and weighed equally.

In order to determine whether economic sanctions are expected to result in the least harm in this case, we need to address two questions: (1) how harmful do we expect the economic sanctions to be? and (2) what is the probability they will succeed in ending the human rights abuses?

(1) It is fair to say that, in general, economic sanctions are less harmful and destructive in their effects than military attack but more harmful and destructive than diplomatic measures (such as travel bans or withdrawing staff from embassies). However, there will be exceptions. For example, a targeted military strike might result in a lot less harm than collective, comprehensive sanctions. It should not always be assumed that economic sanctions are less harmful than military action. Senders should also take care to consider the full range of economic sanctions available to them: targeted sanctions may cause much less harm than collective sanctions but be equally effective.

(2) We also need to consider whether the economic sanctions will be successful at ending the human rights abuses. It is important to take this into account. If economic sanctions do not work, then the target citizens continue to suffer the human rights abuses whilst also suffering the economic sanctions. It would have been better to not have imposed the sanctions at all. From a utilitarian point of view, it is wrong to impose economic sanctions if it is expected that they will fail or that they are very likely to fail. Since economic sanctions often have quite a low probability of success then, at least in the case of more harmful comprehensive sanctions, they will often be ruled out on utilitarian grounds. Of course, this would need to be considered on a case by case basis. Gordon finds the ineffectiveness of economic sanctions particularly troubling, and claims it is unlikely any particular episode of comprehensive sanctions would be justified on utilitarian grounds (Gordon, 1999, 137).

Finally, senders also need to remember that economic sanctions—especially those using an economic pressure mechanism—often take years to work. Military intervention might be a faster way of ending the human rights abuses and consequently be the action that results in the least harm overall. In such a case, utilitarianism would demand military intervention, not economic sanctions.

d. “Clean Hands”

Conventionally, economic sanctions are conceptualised as being measures designed to change the objectionable/unlawful behaviour of targets (or perhaps to punish it). However, Noam Zohar, drawing on Jewish theological tradition, argues in favour of an alternative way of thinking about economic sanctions—that of economic sanctions as a method of ‘preserving clean hands’.

Under a ‘clean hands’ sanctioning policy, the objective of the economic sanctions is not to change a target’s behaviour or to punish it but rather to avoid complicity in that behaviour. Zohar argues, for example, that if one state sells weapons—or allows weapons to be sold by its citizens—to a second state where it knows or suspects those weapons will be used to commit human rights violations, then it facilitates those violations and is thus morally responsibility for them as an accomplice. Hence states have a duty to impose arms embargoes (a type of economic sanction) on targets that they suspect would use those arms to commit human rights violations. Furthermore, clean hands sanctions are not restricted to arms embargoes; Zohar argues that embargoes would be required on all goods which would facilitate wrongdoing. For example, he argues that there is a requirement to prevent oil exports to a state whose military is engaged in ethnic cleansing as oil would be necessary to fuel tanks, planes and so on. (Zohar, 1993). Zohar’s analysis is restricted to cases where a state is violating the human rights of its own citizens. However, it can easily be extended to cover cases where states are engaged in other types of wrongdoing, for example, pursuing aggressive war.

Zohar’s idea is interesting because to date the moral analysis of economic sanctions has almost exclusively assumed that economic sanctions are a prima facie wrong and that their use requires moral justification. However, under a clean hands conception of economic sanctions the imposition of sanctions is, by contrast, a moral duty—a duty derived from the duty not to be complicit in human rights violations. Employing the clean hands conception of economic sanctions thus shifts the burden of moral justification from those who would impose sanctions to those who would not. The clean hands conception therefore appears to be a valuable tool for those who would impose economic sanctions in response to international wrongdoing. However, attractive as it may be, there are some difficulties with Zohar’s view (some of which he acknowledges himself).

The first relates to Zohar’s conception of complicity in wrongdoing. For Zohar, mere suspicion that the goods in question will be used for activities that violate human rights is sufficient to deem the exporting state complicit in the violations. This view of complicity is controversial. Many would argue that an accomplice to a crime must intend—or at least know—that the goods they are supplying will be used to commit a crime. To designate a person an accomplice on the grounds of mere suspicion, they argue, would appear to make one responsible for the crimes of other people, people over whom one has no control. If it cannot be said that the exporting state is complicit in cases of suspicion, then it cannot be said that it has a duty to sanction in these cases (at least not on the grounds that sanctioning would avoid complicity in wrongdoing). This view of complicity would restrict Zohar’s clean hands argument to cases where the exporting state intends or knows the goods supplied will be used in human rights violations.

Second, there is the question of which goods can be said to facilitate human rights violations. It seems obvious that weapons directly facilitate all kinds of human rights violations. But what about other goods? What about food for example? Without food, no military (or any other organisation) can operate. Does this mean that in cases where a state is engaged in human rights violations, there is a duty to sanction food exports? The clean hands argument would seem to suggest there is. For many, however, this conclusion would be too extreme.

Another serious problem relates to the question of dual-use goods. These are goods which have both military and civilian uses. To borrow Zohar’s example, oil may be used to fuel a campaign of ethnic cleansing but it may also be used to heat homes in winter. In cases of multi-lateral sanctions, such as those imposed by the UN, a ban on oil exports could cause civilians to freeze to death (as—in theory at least—no state would sell them oil). Should the UN sanction oil to avoid complicity in ethnic cleansing or should it continue to allow the export of oil to avoid civilians freezing to death? Zohar tentatively suggests that in such cases there may be a duty to engage in a limited military action designed to ensure oil exports are used purely by civilians. This would allow the exporting states to avoid complicity in the ethnic cleansing without causing civilians to freeze to death. He suggests this role could be taken on by the United Nations.

The problem with this suggestion is twofold. First, the limited military action suggested may simply not be possible. The importing state may simply take the oil by force from the UN. Second, even if limited military action were possible, a positive argument would still be required for this course of action. The fact that it resolves the dilemma is not by itself a positive argument in favour given that other methods may also resolve the dilemma, for example, full scale military intervention, and so forth.

e. Summary

Economic sanctions raise serious moral questions that have largely been ignored by philosophers and political theorists. The existing literature on the ethics of economic sanctions, whilst important and illuminating, barely scratches the surface of the subject. Further research in this area is required. There is scope to consider the four frameworks outlined above in more detail and to critique their application and/or the conclusions reached under each of them. There is also scope to develop entirely new frameworks for the moral assessment of economic sanctions.

3. References and Further Reading

a. On the Nature of Economic Sanctions

Andreas, Peter, ‘Criminalizing Consequences of Sanctions: Embargo Busting and its Legacy’, International Studies Quarterly, 49, 2005
Baldwin, David, ‘The Sanctions Debate and the Logic of Choice’, International Security, 24, 1999/2000
Baldwin, David and Pape, Robert ‘Evaluating Economic Sanctions’, International Security, 23, 1998
Baldwin, David, Economic Statecraft, (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985)
Cortright, David & Lopez, George A., Smart Sanctions: Targeting Economic Statecraft, (Lanham Md: Rowman & Littlefield, 2002)
Cortright, David & Lopez, George A., The Sanctions Decade: Assessing UN Strategies in the 1990s, (London: Lynne Rienner Publishers, Inc., 2000)
Crawford, Neta C. & Klotz, Audie, How Sanctions Work: Lessons from South Africa (Basingstoke: MacMillan Press Ltd, 1999)
Doxey, Margaret, International Sanctions in Contemporary Perspective (Basingstoke: MacMillan, 1987)
Elliot, Kimberly Ann, ‘The Sanctions Glass: Half Full or Completely Empty?’, International Security, Vol. 23, No.1, 1998
Galtung, John, ‘On the Effects of International Economic Sanctions: With Examples from the Case of Rhodesia’, World Politics, Vol. 19, Issue 3, 1967
Gordon, Joy, Invisible War, (Harvard University Press, 2010)
Hufbauer, Gary, Jeffrey Schott, and Kimberly Ann Elliott, Economic Sanctions Reconsidered, 3rd edition, (Washington, Peterson Institute for International Economics, 2007)
Pape, Robert A., ‘Why Economic Sanctions Do Not Work’, International Security, Vol. 22, No. 2, 1997
Pape, Robert, ‘Why Economic Sanctions Still Do Not Work’, International Security, Vol. 23, No. 1, 1998
Peksen, Dursun and Drury, Cooper A., ‘Coercive or Corrosive?: The Negative Impact of Economic Sanctions on Democracy’, International Interactions: Empirical and Theoretical Research in International Relations, 36, 2010
Peksen, Dursun and Drury, Cooper A., ‘Economic Sanctions and Political Repression: Assessing the Impact of Coercive Diplomacy on Political Freedoms’, Human Rights Review, 10, 2009
Wood, Reed M., ‘A Hand Upon the Throat of the Nation: Economic Sanctions and State Repression, 1976–2001’, International Studies Quarterly, 52, 2008

b. On the Ethics of Economic Sanctions

Amstutz, Mark, International Ethics: Concepts, Theories, and Cases in Global Politics, 4^th edition, (Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers Inc), 2013, Chapter 10
Christiansen, Drew & Powers, Gerard, F. ‘Economic Sanctions and Just War Doctrine’, in Cortright and Lopez (eds.), Economic Sanctions: Panacea or Peacebuilding? (Oxford: Westview Press, 1995)
Clawson, Patrick, ‘Sanctions as Punishment, Enforcement and Prelude to Further Action’, Ethics and International Affairs, 7, 1999
Damrosch, Lori Fisler, ‘The Collective Enforcement of International Norms through Economic Sanctions’, Ethics and International Affairs, 8, 1994
Ellis, Elizabeth, ‘The Ethics of Economic Sanctions’, PhD Thesis, University of Edinburgh, Edinburgh, 2013
Gordon, Joy, ‘Smart Sanctions Revisited’, Ethics and International Affairs, 25, 2011
Gordon, Joy, ‘A Peaceful, Silent, Deadly Remedy: The Ethics of Economic Sanctions’, Ethics and International Affairs, 13, 1999
Lang, Anthony F., Punishment, Justice and International Relations: Ethics and Order after the Cold War, (London: Routledge, 2008), Chapter 5
Nossal, Kim Richard, ‘International Sanctions as International Punishment’, International Organization, Vol. 43, No. 2, 1989
Pierce, Albert C, ‘Just War Principles and Economic Sanctions’, Ethics and International Affairs, 10, 1996
Winkler, Adam, ‘Just Sanctions’, Human Rights Quarterly, 21, 1999
Zohar, Noam, ‘Boycott, Crime and Sin: Ethical and Tulmudic Responses to Injustice Abroad’, Ethics and International Affairs, Vol. 7, 1993

c. Other Referenced Works

Coates, A.J, The Ethics of War (Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1997)
Rodin, David, War and Self Defence, (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002)
Walzer, Michael, Just and Unjust Wars: A Moral Argument with Historical Illustrations, 4^th edition (New York: Basic Books, 2006)

Author Information

Elizabeth Ellis
Email: E.A.Ellis@leeds.ac.uk
University of Leeds
United Kingdom

Presocratics

Presocratic philosophers are the Western thinkers preceding Socrates (c. 469-c. 399 B.C.E.) but including some thinkers who were roughly contemporary with Socrates, such as Protagoras (c. 490-c. 420 B.C.E.). The application of the term “philosophy” to the Presocratics is somewhat anachronistic, but is certainly different from how many people currently think of philosophy. The Presocratics were interested in a wide variety of topics, especially in what we now think of as natural science rather than philosophy. These early thinkers often sought naturalistic explanations and causes for physical phenomena. For example, the earliest group of Presocratics, the Milesians, each proposed some material element ¾ water, air, the “boundless,” as the basic stuff either forming the foundation of, or constituting, everything in the cosmos.

Such an emphasis on physical explanations marked a break with more traditional ways of thinking that indicated the gods as primary causes. The Presocratics, in most cases, did not entirely abandon theistic or religious notions, but they characteristically posed challenges to traditional ways of thinking. Xenophanes of Colophon, for example, thought that most concepts of the gods were superficial, since they often amount to mere anthropomorphizing. Heraclitus understood sets of contraries, such as day-night, winter-summer, and war-peace to be gods (or God), while Protagoras claimed not to be able to know whether or not the gods exist. The foundation of Presocratic thought is the preference and esteem given to rational thought and argumentation over mythologizing. This movement towards rationality and argumentation would pave the way for the course Western thought.

On “Presocratic” and the Sources
1. The Sources
The Milesians
Xenophanes
Pythagoras and Pythagoreanism
Heraclitus
Eleatic Philosophy
Philosophies of Mixture
1. Anaxagoras
2. Empedocles
  1. Macrocosm
  2. Microcosm
The Atomists
Diogenes of Apollonia
The Sophists and Anonymous Sophistic Texts
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. On “Presocratic” and the Sources

Difficulties are perhaps inevitable any time we lump a group of variegated thinkers under one name. The so-called “Presocratic philosophers” were a group of different thinkers hailing from different places at different times, many who of whom thought about different things. To call them all “Presocratic” thinkers can seem too sweepingly broad and inaccurate, or insensitive to the differences between each of the thinkers. Even, and perhaps especially, where there are similarities, “Presocratic” seems unsatisfactory. For, where the thought of different people deals with similar ideas, a specific name seems appropriate for that group of people. This happens in Presocratic philosophy (for example, the Milesians), but those specific names are treated merely as species of the larger genus that we call “Presocratic philosophy.”

There are also historical difficulties with the term. For example, the atomist Democritus—traditionally considered to be a Presocratic—is supposed to have been approximately contemporary with Socrates. Continuing on with the use of the term then, should be a tentative and careful endeavor. Whatever the case, these thinkers set Western philosophy on its path.

a. The Sources

We have no complete writings from any of the Presocratics, and from some, nothing at all. Our sources, then, are primarily twofold: fragments and testimonia. The fragments are purported bits of the thinkers’ actual words. These might be fragments of books that they wrote, or simply recorded sayings. In any case, there are no surviving complete works from the Presocratics. Moreover, it is important to remember that there are no original compositions—of any length or degree of completeness—available. Neither, for that matter, are any originals available from Plato or Aristotle. In the pre-printing press days, scribes copied whatever editions of books and other written works they had available to them. We have texts that have been copied many times over. This means that, even with the fragments, we can never be sure whether or not the words we are reading correspond exactly to the original ideas that the Presocratics expressed.

The ancient testimonies come to us from several sources, each having its own agenda and degree of reliability. Both Plato and Aristotle explicitly name many of the Presocratics, sometimes discussing their supposed ideas at length. We must recognize that both Plato and Aristotle almost certainly treated Presocratic thought in light of their own respective philosophical agendas. Therefore, the information we get from them about the Presocratics is likely skewed and sometimes arrantly false. Plato wrote philosophical-literary dialogues, and likely needed to represent the Presocratics in his own peculiar ways to meet the needs of the dialogues. Aristotle, who wrote in the treatise style to which we are more accustomed today, also references the Presocratics in the context of his own philosophy. Aristotle would set out to write on a particular topic (for example, physics), and would survey the ideas of his predecessors on that same topic. In doing so, he at times agreed with their positions, and often disagreed with them. We have to beware, especially where Aristotle disagreed with his predecessors, of a possible (and possibly intentional) straw-man technique that Aristotle might have employed to advance his own position. Thus, while the accounts of Plato and Aristotle can be useful, we should read them cautiously.

2. The Milesians

While it might be inaccurate to call them a school of thinkers, the Milesian philosophers do have connections that are not merely geographical. Hailing from Miletus in Ionia (modern day Turkey), Thales, Anaximander, and Anaximenes each broke with the poetic and mythological tradition handed down by Hesiod and Homer. With what little we know about the Milesians, we do not consider them philosophers in the same way that we consider Plato, Aristotle, and their successors philosophers. Much of what we know about them suggests that they were protoscientists, concerned with cosmogony, which wasthe generation of the cosmos; and cosmology, the study of or inquiry into the nature of the cosmos. Their cosmogonies and cosmologies are oriented primarily by naturalistic explanations, descriptions, and conjectures, rather than traditional mythology. In other words, the Milesians ostensibly sought to explain the cosmos on its own terms, rather than pointing to the gods as the causes or progenitors of all natural phenomena.

The geographical placement of Miletus is noteworthy. It is not unlikely that someone like Thales, for example, travelled to Egypt and perhaps to Babylon. Indeed, there is great evidence to suggest that the Babylonians, in some fashion or another, contributed significantly to ancient Greek knowledge of astronomy and mathematics. This is important to keep in mind when considering Presocratic discoveries in astronomy, mathematics, and other fields. There is scant evidence to suggest that this or that Presocratic thinker was the sole inventor or discoverer in any particular scientific finding or field.

a. Thales

Typically considered to be the first philosopher in the history of Western philosophy, Thales (c. 624-c. 545 B.C.E.) is a figure surrounded by legend and anecdotes. The historian Herodotus says that Thales proposed a single congress for Ionia, effectively centralizing the governmental powers, and making Ionia a single state (Graham 23). In a Lydian military campaign, he is supposed to have diverted the Halys river so that the Lydian military could safely cross in the absence of bridges (Graham 25). Aristotle relays another story, claiming to show us how Thales defended himself and philosophers against claim that philosophers are useless. Through astronomy, Thales was purportedly able to predict a good olive harvest for a particular year. That winter, he bid on the region’s olive presses, and since no one bid against him (they apparently found his prediction incredible), he put down only a small sum. “When harvest time came and everyone needed the presses right away, he charged whatever he wished and made a good deal of money—thus demonstrating that it is easy for philosophers to get rich if they wish, but that is not what they care about” (Graham 25). Plato relates the humorous story that Thales fell into a well while stargazing. “A Thracian servant girl with a sense of humor…made fun of him for being so eager to find out what was in the sky that he was not aware of what was in front of him right at his feet” (Graham 25). Thus, this might be the first anecdote of the impractical and incompetent philosopher who proves himself practically competent, but ultimately unconcerned with worldly affairs.

While we have no way of knowing whether or not any of these stories square with the facts, they paint a picture of Thales as a practical and theoretical wise man—a picture that attracted the eyes of most ancient authorities. He is said to have predicted a solar eclipse in 585, helping the Ionians in battle, since he informed them of the coming darkness, and the enemy was, literally, left in the dark (Graham 23). It is also reported that Thales was highly influential in his work in geometry, if not being entirely responsible for introducing it to Greece from Egypt. Indeed, he is supposed to have discovered that two triangles sharing a side and having equal adjacent angles are congruent (Graham 35), that a circle is bisected by its diameter (Graham 33), and that angles at the base of two isosceles triangles are equal (Graham 35).

Perhaps because of Thales, Milesian philosophy has running through it a taste for the first principles or beginnings of the cosmos. Thales supposed the principle or source (arche) of all things to be water. Aristotle guesses some reasons why Thales might have believed this (Graham 29). First, all things seem to derive nourishment from moisture. Next, heat seems to come from or carry with it some sort of moisture. Finally, the seeds of all things have a moist nature, and water is the source of growth for many moist and living things. Some assert that Thales held water to be a component of all things, but there is no evidence in the testimony for this interpretation. It is much more likely, rather, that Thales held water to be a primal source for all things—perhaps the sine qua non of the world.

It is unclear just how far we are to take Thales here, or precisely how, or if, water plays a role in every cosmological phenomenon. While Thales did turn to naturalistic explanations of the cosmos, he did not abandon belief in the gods. He was supposed to have thought that “all things are full of gods,” and that water is pervaded by a divine power, which also moves the water (Graham 35). If all things either are water, or can ultimately be traced in some way to water, water itself becomes divine—it is the life of the universe, and thus all things are in some way divine. Moreover, if water is more or less connected with some particular thing in the cosmos, then it would stand to reason that some things are more or less divine. As Aetius testifies, “Thales said that God is the mind of the world, and the totality is at once animate and full of deities. And a divine power pervades the elemental moisture and moves it” (Graham 35)). Thales, then, did not abandon theology in favor of naturalism, but rather radically modified it.

b. Anaximander

Anaximander (c. 610-c. 545 B.C.E.) followed in Thales’ footsteps (he might have been Thales’ student) by applying his astronomical knowledge to practical life on earth. He was supposed to have invented the gnomon, a simple sundial (Graham 49). He may have introduced the knowledge of the solstices and equinox to the Greeks, as well as the twelve-hour division of the day—knowledge he probably gained from the Babylonians (Graham 49). He travelled extensively, gaining first-hand geographical knowledge. Indeed, he was supposed to have drawn a map of the earth as he knew it (Graham 49).

Like Thales, Anaximander also posited a source for the cosmos, which he called the boundless (apeiron). That he did not, like Thales, choose a typical element (earth, air, water, or fire), shows that his thinking had moved beyond the more possibly evident sources of being. He might have thought that, since the other elements seem more or less to change into one another, there must be some source beyond all these—a kind of background upon or source from which all these changes happen. Indeed, this everlasting principle gave rise to the cosmos by generating hot and cold, each of which “separated off” from the boundless. How it is that this separation took place is unclear, but we might presume that it happened via the natural force of the boundless. The universe, though, is a continual play of elements separating and combining. In poetic fashion, Anaximander says that the boundless is the source of beings, and that into which they perish, “according to what must be: for they give recompense and pay restitution to each other for their injustice according to the ordering of time” (F1).

In the generation of the cosmos as we know it now, human beings came to be from other animals. While it would be inaccurate to call Anaximander the father of the theory of evolution, the history of that theory should at least make mention of his name. Anaximander thought that human beings could not have been at their origin the way that they are now. That is, they must have arisen from some other animals, since human beings need longer stretches of time for nurture than other animals. They could not have survived, he reasons, without the generative help of other animals (Graham 57). He thought that human beings arose from or were at least akin to fish (Graham 59). Beyond this, humans seem to have needed moisture and heat for their generation. More specifically, humans originated with moisture in some sort of shell, and eventually matured, moved onto land, “and survived in a different form for a short while” (Graham 63). What evidence Anaximander might have had to support these claims we can only guess, but his willingness to explain the world on its own terms, without recourse to divine generation or intervention (although he might well have considered the boundless to be divine), is the mark of a new way of thinking.

c. Anaximenes

If our dates are approximate, Anaximenes (c.546-c.528/5 B.C.E.) could have had no direct philosophical contact with Anaximander. However, the conceptual link between them is undeniable. Like Anaximander, Anaximenes thought that there was something boundless that underlies all other things. Unlike Anaximander, Anaximenes made this boundless thing something definite—air. For Anaximander, hot and cold separated off from the boundless, and these generated other natural phenomena (Graham 79). For Anaximenes, air itself becomes other natural phenomena through condensation and rarefaction. Rarefied air becomes fire. When it is condensed, it becomes water, and when it is condensed further, it becomes earth and other earthy things, like stones (Graham 79). This then gives rise to all other life forms. Furthermore, air itself is divine. Both Cicero and Aetius report that, for Anaximenes, air is God (Graham 87). Air, then, changes into the basic elements, and from these we get all other natural phenomena. This means that ostensibly qualitative properties of things, for example, hot-cold, hard-soft, and so forth, are reducible to quantitative properties (McKirahan 51). Since air is boundless, it does not have a beginning or end, but is in a constant state of flux. Air is the morphological thread binding all things together.

A rather convenient psychological takeaway from Anaximenes’ theory is that the soul (psychê), traditionally considered to be breath, is itself airy (Graham 87). So, the individual human soul is in some way divine since each human being partakes of air. Again, it is remarkable that Anaximines, like his fellow Milesians, did not have recourse to Homeric or Hesiodic mythology to explain the world. The Milesians arguably stand at the beginning, at least as the testimony and scant textual evidence has it, of a distinct way of thinking that we consider to be scientific, however primitive it may be. Despite this inclination toward naturalistic explanations of the world, they considered the gods to be thoroughly infused with their world. With the Milesians comes a radical shift in thought. The radical nature of their thinking does not depend upon a rejection of all divinity, but a reformation in the way we think about it. This leads us to Xenophanes, who first explicitly formulated a critique of traditional ways of thinking about divinity.

3. Xenophanes

Xenophanes (c. 570-c. 478 B.C.E.) was from Colophon, north of Miletus in Ionia. He did not remain in Colophon, but travelled around Greece reciting his poetry, finally settling in modern day Sicily. Since his views were expressed poetically, it is at times difficult to know how to interpret them. Thus, we should keep in mind that, while we have more fragmentary material from Xenophanes than all of the Milesians taken together, the way in which his views were expressed, and the fragmentary nature of our sources, prevents us from being certain about what exactly he meant. What exposure he might have had to Milesian thought we do not know. Like the Milesians, however, he challenged traditional theological views, but in a new way. Even his social views seem to have been at odds with the ancient Greek sensibilities. For example, he renounces the glorification and honorific status of athletes, saying that wisdom should be preferred (F2).

Unlike the Milesians (or the evidence we have of them), Xenophanes directly and explicitly challenged Homeric and Hesiodic mythology. “It is good,” says Hesiod, “to hold the gods in high esteem,” rather than portraying them in “raging battles, which are worthless” (F2). More explicitly, “Homer and Hesiod have attributed to the gods all things that are blameworthy and disgraceful for human beings: stealing, committing adultery, deceiving each other” (F17). At the root of this poor depiction of the gods is the human tendency towards anthropomorphizing the gods. “But mortals think gods are begotten, and have the clothing, voice and body of mortals” (F19), despite the fact that God is unlike mortals in body and thought. Indeed, Xenophanes famously proclaims that if other animals (cattle, lions, and so forth) were able to draw the gods, they would depict the gods with bodies like their own (F20). Beyond this, all things come to be from earth (F27), not the gods, although it is unclear whence the earth came. The reasoning seems to be that God transcends all of our efforts to make him like us. If everyone paints different pictures of divinity, and many people do, then it is unlikely that God fits into any of those frames. So, holding “the gods in high esteem” at least entails something negative, that is, that we take care not to portray them as super humans.

We have seen what the gods are not, but what is God or the gods? It is unclear whether or not Xenophanes was a theological monist or pluralist, but he seems at least to hint at either one God only, or one God above all others. “One God, greatest among gods and men…” (F23) could mean that there is one God only, despite the fact that mortals talk about a plurality of Gods, or that there is one God who is greater than all the rest. This God, in his entirety, sees, thinks, hears, and shakes all things by the thought of his mind (F24-F25). He remains, unmoving, in the same place (F26). If God is in some place, does this not mean that he is embodied? This is unclear, but Aristotle claims that Xenophanes thought of God as spherical, presumably based upon the picture of uniformity portrayed in the preceding fragments (Graham 113). We might also wonder whether or not this depiction of God, too, is in some way anthropomorphizing. How do we know that God has a mind, or that he hears, sees, and thinks? Xenophanes does not present us with answers to these questions. Whatever the case, Xenophanes’ God is unlike any previous conceptions of divinity, and seems to have set in motion a long tradition of critical and rational theology.

Ultimately, we can never know the full and simple truth about the gods or anything else. Even if we successfully describe events in our world, we cannot claim knowledge about such things; for, “opinion is wrought over all” (F35). This, however, apparently does not prevent us, through an effort of seeking, from understanding things better. If Xenophanes is a skeptic, therefore, his skepticism is pliable and open-ended. By rejecting dogmas, Xenophanes is willing to make rational conjectures about God.

4. Pythagoras and Pythagoreanism

Ancient thought was left with such a strong presence and legacy of Pythagorean influence, and yet little is known with certainty about Pythagoras of Samos (c. 570-c. 490 B.C.E.). A great deal of legend surrounds the life of Pythagoras. Scholars generally agree that Pythagoras left Samos for Croton, where he enjoyed political esteem as a ruler. His political success, however, was not his philosophical legacy, but instead the almost religious following that developed in his name (perhaps because of his political success). He developed a following that continued long past his death, on down to Philolaus of Croton (c. 470-c. 399 B.C.E.), a Pythagorean from whom we may gain some insight into Pythagoreanism. Whether or not the Pythagoreans followed a particular doctrine is up for debate, but it is clear that, with Pythagoras and the Pythagoreans, a new way of thinking was born in ancient philosophy, and had a significant impact on Platonic thought.

Many know Pythagoras for his eponymous theorem—the square of the hypotenuse of a right triangle is equal to the sum of the squares of the adjacent sides. Whether Pythagoras himself invented the theorem, or whether he or someone else brought it back from Egypt, is unknown. He was accorded almost godlike status among his followers, some saying that there are three classes of rational beings: the gods, human beings, and beings like Pythagoras (Graham 921). He was said to have a golden thigh, to have been hailed by name by the river Cosas, and to have been seen simultaneously in both Metapontum and Croton (Graham 919). Empedocles sung his praises by saying that Pythagoras could, by the power of his mind, behold all things “for ten or even twenty generations of men” (Graham 917).

One doctrine that scholars confidently attribute to Pythagoras and his followers is the transmigration of souls. The soul, for Pythagoras, finds its immortality by cycling through all living beings in a 3,000-year cycle, until it returns to a human being (Graham 915). Indeed, Xenophanes tells the story of Pythagoras walking by a puppy who was being beaten. Pythagoras cried out that the beating should cease, because he recognized the soul of a friend in the puppy’s howl (Graham 919). Another Pythagorean view seems not to have restricted a life cycle to souls, but widened the scope to all things, such that there is nothing completely new, since everything has happened before and will happen again (Graham 919). What exactly the Pythagorean psychology entails for a Pythagorean lifestyle is unclear, but we pause to consider some of the typical characteristics reported of and by Pythagoreans.

Pythagoreans were famous for their silence (Graham 911). Their teachings were transmitted cryptically, and it is unclear how strict of a doctrine the followers were demanded to observe. Some are reported to have refrained from eating or handling beans, either because they resemble genitals or the gates of Hades. Some were commanded not to sacrifice a white rooster, since white symbolized purity and goodness, and because roosters are sacred to Men, and thus roosters announce the sunrise in the morning (Graham 923). There were also the akousmatikoi (things heard), which were expressed in three categories: what something is, what the most x is (for example, what is the wisest?), and what one should or should not do (e.g abstention from beans or sacrificing white cocks). The Oracle at Delphi was said to be the tetractys and, therefore, harmony, which satisfies the first set of akousmatikoi. Number is said to be the wisest, with giving names to things coming in second for wisdom (Graham 923).

Plato and Aristotle tended to associate the holiness and wisdom of number—and along with this, harmony and music—with the Pythagoreans (Graham 499). For example, the decad was sacred. The tetractys shows us the holiness of the number ten.

Here, we can see a relationship among numbers, all of which leads us to a figure. There is the one, which begets plurality (two). When we add three and four to these, there is the sum of ten, which signifies the composition of the cosmos (Graham 499). There were nine visible heavenly bodies, and so the Pythagoreans posited a tenth body, counter-earth, to balance out the cosmos. The tetractys also gives us the ratios of harmony: 1:2, 2:3, and 3:4, or the octave, the fifth, and the fourth, respectively (McKirahan 92). The universe is harmony, and Philolaus considered the soul also to be a harmony (Graham 505). Thus, at least for Philolaus, the soul could be considered to be a type of microcosm.

Perhaps more basic than number, at least for Philolaus, are the concepts of the limited and unlimited. Nothing in the cosmos can be without limit (F1), including knowledge (F4). Imagine if nothing were limited, but matter were just an enormous heap or morass. Next, suppose that you are somehow able to gain a perspective of this morass (to do so, there must be some limit that gives you that perspective!). Presumably, nothing at all could be known, at least not with any degree of precision, the most careful observation notwithstanding. Additionally, all known things have number, and number is classed in two kinds: odd and even (F6). Number, too, can be seen here as a kind of limiter. Each thing is one, and thus separate from other things.

There is evidence to suggest that some Pythagoreans gave credence to a list of opposites in addition to limit-unlimited and odd-even: one-plurality, right-left, male-female, rest-motion, straight-bent, light-dark, good-evil, square-oblong. The left side of each of these binaries would be organized in one column, while the right side would be organized in a parallel column. Although it is unclear how, these columns of opposites somehow give us insight into the basic stuff of the cosmos and of being. Notice also that there are ten pairs of opposites. Limit-unlimited and odd-even are listed first, and these give rise to the rest of the cosmos (McKirahan 97). Thus, the Pythagoreans saw a universe whose nature is numerical, but also one in the tension of harmony, and similar to Heraclitus, the tension of opposites.

5. Heraclitus

Just south of Colophon in Ionia was Ephesus, where yet more new philosophical blood was circulating. Heraclitus (c. 540-c. 480 B.C.E.) stands out in ancient Greek philosophy not only with respect to his ideas, but also with respect to how those ideas were expressed. His aphoristic style is rife with wordplay and conceptual ambiguities. Heraclitus was getting at what he saw as a reality composed of contraries—a reality, too, whose continual process of change is precisely what keeps it at rest. Such a unique style of thought and expression seems to have sprung forth from a life just as unique, and perhaps even contrarian. While we often do well to proceed cautiously with Diogenes Laertius’ accounts of the philosophers, his account of Heraclitus is telling, and fits with Heraclitus’ sometimes scathing thought. Diogenes Laertius calls him “conceited” and “haughty,” citing as evidence Heraclitus’ denunciation of Hesiod, Pythagoras, Xenophanes, and Hecataeus as people who have learned much (literally, polymaths), but understand little. Diogenes Laertius says that Heraclitus “studied with no one, but asserted he inquired of himself and learned everything by himself” (Graham 139). Indeed, when reading Heraclitus, one can easily imagine a loner whose originality of thought was closely linked with, if not born from, that solitude.

He is often critical of the ignorance—that is, the lack of genuine understanding—of the majority of human beings. He speaks of a logos (translatable as “word,” “reason,” “rationality,” “language,” “ratio,” and so forth) that most human beings do not understand, neither before nor after they hear it. Many people are asleep, despite being awake. “Having heard without comprehension, they are like the deaf; this saying bears witness to them: present they are absent” (F6). Pronouncing a sentiment further echoed in Plato and Aristotle, Heraclitus says, “the many are base, while the few are noble” (F12). Most people do not observe the world carefully enough, and few attain a true understanding of it. There is in Heraclitus a distinction between having much information under one’s belt, and understanding how all of it fits together, what it all means, that is, its overall significance.

One might wonder whether or not God, for Heraclitus, is synonymous with reality, so that a real understanding of the universe is an understanding of what is sacred. God is “day night, winter summer, war peace, satiety hunger…” (F103). Fire plays a significant role in his picture of the cosmos. No God or man created the cosmos, but it always was, is, and will be fire. At times it seems as though fire, for Heraclitus, is a primary element from which all things come and to which they return. At others, his comments on fire could easily be seen metaphorically. What is fire? It is at once “need and satiety.” This back and forth, or better yet, this tension and distension is characteristic of life and reality—a reality that cannot function without contraries, such as war and strife. “A road up and down is one and the same” (F38). Whether one travels up the road or down it, the road is the same road. “On those stepping into rivers staying the same other and other waters flow” (F39). In his Cratylus, Plato quotes Heraclitus, via the mouthpiece of Cratylus, as saying that “you could not step twice into the same river,” comparing this to the way everything in life is in constant flux (Graham 158). This, according to Aristotle, supposedly drove Cratylus to the extreme of never saying anything for fear that the words would attempt to freeze a reality that is always fluid, and so, Cratylus merely pointed (Graham 183). Whether or not this is a fair interpretation of Heraclitus, we can see that change plays a central role in his thought. Yet, Heraclitus recognizes that “changing it rests” (F52). So, the cosmos and all things that make it up are what they are through the tension and distention of time and becoming. The river is what it is by being what it is not. Fire, or the ever burning cosmos, is at war with itself, and yet at peace—it is constantly wanting fuel to keep burning, and yet it burns and is satisfied.

6. Eleatic Philosophy

Three important thinkers fall under the category of Eleatic thought: Parmenides, Zeno, and Melissus. The latter was not from Elea as the former two were, but his thought directly inherits the monism typical of Parmenides and Zeno. Thus, Melissus will be treated in this section after Parmenides and Zeno.

a. Parmenides

If it is true that for Heraclitus life thrives and even finds stillness in its continuous movement and change, then for Parmenides (c. 515-c. 450 B.C.E.) life is at a standstill. Haling from Elea (a Greek colony in modern day Italy), and the father of Eleatic philosophy, Parmenides was a pivotal figure in Presocratic thought, and one of the most influential of the Presocratics in determining the course of Western philosophy. According to McKirahan, Parmenides is the inventor of metaphysics (157)—the inquiry into the nature of being or reality. While the tenets of his thought have their home in poetry, they are expressed with the force of logic. The Parmenidean logic of being thus sparked a long lineage of inquiry into the nature of being and thinking.

Parmenides’ poem moves in three parts: a sort of foreword (proemium), a section on Truth, and a section on Opinion (the way of mortals). The narrator of the poem describes allegorically a journey in a chariot, led speedily along by mares, but guided by maidens from the House of Night. He was led to the threshold of the paths of Night and Day, where Justice holds the keys that open the door to each. The maidens persuaded Justice, with gentle words, to open the door between Night and Day, whereupon the travellers were greeted by a goddess, who claims to teach the only paths for thought: “the one: that it is and that it is not possible not to be, is the path of Persuasion (for she attends on Truth); the other: that it is not and that it is right it should not be, this I declare to you is an utterly inscrutable track, for neither could you know what is not (for it cannot be accomplished), nor could you declare it” (F2). The “inscrutable” track is the path of mortals (Opinion), while the former is the path of Truth. Curiously, the goddess urges the sojourner to learn both, claiming that “it is right for you to learn all things.” The goddess suggests that, although the path of Opinion is ultimately wrong-headed, it is nevertheless wise to understand why such a path is one to which many so often cling.

i. The Path of Being

The first path is the path of being. The Greek word esti(n) is the third person singular of the verb to be. It need not express a subject, and does not in Parmenides’ poem. We therefore import the English word “it” into the translation for smooth English. There is much debate about the way Parmenides uses to be in his poem, but the possibilities are these. First, he might have used esti in an existential sense, that is, that something simply exists (for example, Spot exists). Second, he might have meant esti in the predicative sense, for example, “the t-shirt is red.” Third, esti could take a sense of identity, as in, “A=B.” Fourth is the veridical sense, or, “it is true that X.” Finally, there could be some combination of some or all of these senses of esti (Sedley 114-115 and McKirahan, 160-163). Whatever the case, Parmenides does seem to have in mind the whole—all of being. As soon as we differentiate among types of beings, we have entered into the way of Opinion or plurality.

The right way of thinking is to think of what-is, and the wrong way is to think both what-is and what-is-not. The latter is wrong, and the goddess forbids it, simply because non-being is not. In other words, there is no non-being, so properly speaking, it cannot be thought—there is nothing there to think. We can think only what is and, presumably, since thinking is a type of being, “thinking and being are the same” (F3). It is only our long entrenched habits of sensation that mislead us into thinking down the wrong path. We are, as it were, “two-headed” and helpless in our ignorant journey down the path of Opinion, and we mistakenly think that being and non-being are the same.

The goddess names several characteristics of what-is. It is ungenerated and imperishable, whole and one, unperturbed, complete, completely present (without past or future), and continuous. Parmenides makes use of the Principle of Sufficient Reason to say that there is no sufficient reason for being, or what-is, to have been generated at this time or that (McKirahan 167). If at one time it came to be, that means that at one time it was not, which is impossible. It cannot not be, that is, what-is is necessary. Moreover, what-is is motionless, since motion would involve non-being, that is, changing in place or in quality requires going from what is to what is not. It is therefore the same all around and held within a limit, “which confines it round about” (F8.31). Parmenides goes so far as to compare it to a ball, maintaining balance and equal tension in all directions from the center out. It is thus complete. Is it problematic to have being bounded by a limit? Would this not mean that there is something outside being, effectively making what is outside its limits non-being? Apparently, we are to remain resolute in thinking of the sphere as complete and as all being, even though we mortals sometimes mistakenly divide it up, or conceive it as something inside a container.

ii. The Path of Opinion

Now the goddess presents the way of Opinion. She claims that her words about this way will be illusory or deceptive, meaning that the subject matter itself produces the deception. Mortals claim that there is both being and non-being. We observe the world with our senses, and put too much faith in these rather than in reason, which tells us that there is only one true way—being. Oddly, our interpretations of Parmenides become even more obscured when we reach this section. The reader is tempted to believe that Parmenides himself gave at least some degree of credence to mortal opinion. Indeed, we are told that Parmenides considered the earth and fire to be the sources of all that it is. Aristotle says that Parmenides does this in order to explain why, for reason, there is only one eternal being, while for the senses, there is a plurality of beings. Parmenides classified the hot, then, as what-is, and the cold as non-being (Graham 221).

Parmenides must in some way account for the fact that most human beings hold fast to the information that the senses provide. If most of us are in error, it is a subtle and elusive one. Since, by habit, we are so easily convinced of the truth of the senses, Parmenides attempts to explain why this is, and also attempts to give us a more intelligible account of the sensible world. The information we have does not present a clear picture of Parmenides’ vision of the cosmos, but it does give us some ideas of its nature. The hot is responsible for separation, and the cold is responsible for coalescence. Beyond this, Parmenides seems to have been a rather serious astronomer, whose astronomical theory in some important ways prefigures modern astronomy. He may have been the first Greek—the Babylonians already being privy to it—to have claimed the morning and evening star to be the same thing (Graham 225). He also claimed that the moon’s light is a reflection of the sun’s light. He may even have thought that the earth was spherical (Graham 241). Again, the earth, like being, has no reason to move this way or that, due to its equilibrium.

We see in Parmenides a reverence for reason. Even his cosmology is based upon reason rather than the senses alone. In a time before telescopes or any other sophisticated observational technology, Parmenides had to move beyond the evidence of the senses alone to determine that the morning and evening star is the same, and that the moon reflects the sun’s light. To all appearances, the moon somehow generates its own light. Parmenides, however, moved beyond appearances to explain appearances. For this very reason there is also tension in Parmenides’ thought. No matter how much faith we put in reason, and no matter how much we deny the evidence of the senses, the sensory world still convincingly thrusts itself upon us, and demands our thought, attention, and understanding. Perhaps in the end this understanding of the natural world, which to all appearances is a mixture of being and non-being, shows us a unified, eternal and simple being.

b. Zeno

Zeno (c. 490-c. 430 B.C.E.), also a native of Elea, was Parmenides’ student and possibly his boyfriend (homosexuality in ancient Greek culture was fairly common—among intellectuals, the student performed favors in order to receive the teacher’s wisdom). As Daniel Graham says, “Parmenides argues for monism, Zeno argues against pluralism” (Graham 245). That is, Zeno seems to have composed a text wherein he claims to show the absurdity of accepting that there is a plurality of beings. He uses arguments, often in a reductio ad absurdum form, to prove positively that there cannot be plurality, and negatively (or by an implied inference), that the only possibility is that what-is is one. Beyond this, he argued against motion and against place. Suffice to say, Zeno’s paradoxes have since his day provided problems for philosophers and mathematicians alike. Let us examine some of Zeno’s arguments.

i. Arguments against Plurality

Many of Zeno’s arguments can be dizzying. One argument contains an important claim upon which many other arguments have their foundation. There might have been an argument for this claim, but there is none extant (Graham 267). For the sake of clarity, Graham’s summary of this initial claim (claim (a) below) and following arguments will be quoted:

(a) If there are many things, no one has size because it is one and the same as itself.

(b) If each of the many did not have size, it would not exist, for if it were added to or subtracted from something, it would make no difference to that thing.

(c) If there are many things, each must have size and solidity, and hence each must have parts with size and solidity, and similarly each of these parts must have parts.

(d) Hence, if there are many things, they must be both small and large; so small as to have no size, and so large as to be unlimited (infinite). (267)

The set of arguments (b)-(d) is aiming to disprove plurality. These arguments seem somehow to be based upon (a), which seems to be the conclusion of an argument for which we have no premises. At the least, we can see here, if only obscurely, Zeno’s efforts to deny pluralism.

An argument from Plato’s Parmenides goes like this. If there are many things, then each thing will be both like and unlike, and so a contradiction ensues (F1). For example, body X will be like bodies Y and Z in that all three are bodies taking up space. Yet, each of the three will be unlike the other since, let us suppose, X is red, Y is blue, and Z is green. Thus, X is both like and unlike Y and Z. If this is all there was to Zeno’s argument, as Plato presents it (perhaps simply for the dramatic purposes of the dialogue), then it is not a contradiction, since each body is like and unlike the other in different respects (McKirahan 182).

Zeno shows that if we attempt to count a plurality, we also end up with an absurdity. If there are is a plurality, then there would be neither more nor less than the number that they are. Thus, there would be a finite number of things. On the other hand, if there is a plurality, then the number would be infinite, because there is always something else between existing things, and something else between those, and something else between those, ad infinitum. Thus, if there were a plurality of things, then that plurality

would be both infinite and finite in number, which is absurd (F4).

ii. Dichotomy

A central argument, at least in what we have available of Zeno’s work, is what the ancients called the argument from dichotomy. There are two versions of this argument. In the first, we suppose that what-is is divisible, and then we end up with two absurdities. If it is divisible, it will be divided down into a an infinite number of finite parts, or it will be divided so much that nothing at all is left over. The first option is less clear. Zeno probably has in mind that an infinite number of finite parts would go to make up something that is infinitely great in size when taken as a whole (as above). The second option is clearly absurd. Therefore, being or what-is is one and indivisible (Graham 259).

iii. Infinite Divisibility and Arguments against Motion

The idea of infinite divisibility plays a key role in many of Zeno’s arguments. For example, let us look at his arguments against motion. It is impossible for a body in motion to traverse, say, a distance of twenty feet. In order to do so, the body must first arrive at the halfway point, or ten feet. But in order to arrive there, the body in motion must travel five feet. But in order to arrive there, the body must travel two and a half feet, ad infinitum. Since, then, space is infinitely divisible, but we have only a finite time to traverse it, it cannot be done. Presumably, one could not even begin a journey at all. Aristotle criticized this argument by saying that there are two senses of “infinite” with reference to magnitudes: there is infinite divisibility and infinity with reference to extremes (Graham 261). We cannot get through an infinite quantity in a finite time, but one can get through an infinitely divisible space, because time is also infinitely divisible. If there is a parallel between the divisibility of space and time, then we can cross an infinitely divisible span of space, because there will be a bit of time measuring each bit of the motion in which to do it.

Similar to this argument is the Achilles argument. Swift-footed Achilles will never be able to catch up with the slowest runner, assuming the runner started at some point ahead of Achilles, because Achilles must first reach the place where the slow runner began. This means that the slow runner will already be a bit beyond where he began. Once Achilles progresses to the next place, the slow runner is already beyond that point, too. Thus, motion seems absurd.

Again, an arrow flying from point A to point B is actually not in motion. At each moment in its apparent flight, it occupies a place equal to its size. If something occupies a place equal to itself, it must be at rest, since nothing can be in a place equal to itself while in motion. Thus, the arrow is not actually in flight, but at rest in its place. Aristotle’s criticism here is that Zeno assumes time to be composed of indivisible moments or “nows.” Now the arrow is here, and now it is here, and now it is here, and so on. The other assumption of Zeno’s argument is that something is only in a place when it is at rest. He also argues against place, however, by saying that if something is in a place, then that place must be in a place, and that place must be in a place, ad infinitum. Thus, if everything is in a place, then there would be infinite places of those places, and this is absurd (Graham 261).

The most conceptually difficult argument is the Stadium or Moving Rows paradox. Suppose there is a set of bodies at one end of a racetrack and one at another. They will both move in opposite directions at equal speeds and will thereby run past one another. They will both pass by a third set of stationary bodies equal in size to the racing bodies. The Stadium paradox is often illustrated in the following way.

The Bs and Cs are in motion, while the As are stationary. The Bs and Cs are moving at an equal and constant rate of speed. Since their starting point is the middle A, so to speak, it should take the Bs and Cs twice as long to bypass each other as it takes them to bypass the As. That is, the rightmost B must move past only one A, while it must move past two Cs, and the leftmost C must move past two Bs, but only one A. The Cs and Bs have therefore moved across both a longer and a shorter distance at the same time; thus the contradiction (Graham 263). Aristotle, however, says that this reasoning is fallacious since the Bs and Cs are in motion. Since they are in motion, and moving at an equal speed, it will take them half as long to move past each other as it does to pass a stationary A (Graham 263). Some commentators, thinking that Zeno could not possibly have made such an egregious error, suppose that Zeno might have intended for each body in the row to be atomic, i.e., indivisible. If this were the case, then a B cannot move past only half of an A or a C (since they are indivisible), but must move past the whole body at once. Thus, Zeno’s paradox would remain intact, although we have no textual evidence that this is what Zeno had in mind (McKirahan 192).

The final paradox is the millet seed paradox, which is either given to us in an incomplete way, or is simply fallacious. If a bushel of millet seeds dropped, it will make a sound. If this is true, then one millet seed when dropped should also make a sound, and one ten thousandth of a part should as well. But this does not happen. As it is, there are two problems with this argument. On the surface, we do not know what Zeno meant to prove from this. Logically, the argument commits the fallacy of division. Just because the whole (the bushel) makes a sound when dropped, we cannot conclude that any given part (one ten thousandth of a seed) will as well (Graham 265). Whatever the case, the overall picture of Zeno is of his fight against plurality and motion for the sake of monism.

c. Melissus

We know little about Melissus’ life except that he was an admiral and organized a battle against the Athenians (c. 441 B.C.E.). Philosophically, he clearly defends Parmenidean monism, although he does differ from Parmenides on at least two counts: the temporality of what-is, and whether or not what-is is unlimited or limited. He also differs from Zeno by laying out a clear thesis defending the unity of being.

Melissus sets out a system of concomitant and sequential arguments. First, what-is, or being, cannot have come from nothing. Nor could being have come to be from what-is, because this would mean that being already was. Likewise, and perhaps inversely to the first principle, being cannot become non-being. It therefore cannot perish. So, being, or what-is, is everlasting. Next, since it is everlasting—it does not come to be or perish—it has no limits set upon it, and so it is unlimited (apeiron). From this, we can see that being is one. If it were two or more, then each would be limited by the other. This leads us to see that what-is must be the same as itself, and therefore cannot be subject to the throes and flux of rearranging, pain, or any other sort of passion. Closely related to this, what-is must be motionless, since motion is a type of change. Similarly, there is no void, since the void would be nothing. This is another reason why what-is cannot move. To move, there must be emptiness or void, but since void cannot exist, we are left with fullness, that is, being is a plenum (Graham 467).

What is Melissus’ answer to the objection that we clearly observe with our senses flux and change in the world? He claims that there is only one thing that follows from his thesis. If there really is earth, fire, different types of metals, and so forth, then they must be like the one or what-is—they must each be as we first perceive them to be, for example, this here is fire, and that there is earth, and nothing else. However, when we think we see something hot becoming cold, then we simply have not observed correctly. “For they would not change if they were real, but they would remain just such as each appeared to be” (F8). Melissus does not explain what it is about our observation that goes awry. How is it that we make mistakes like thinking that we have observed a metal corroding? Melissus has no satisfactory answer to this question. If, he says, we observe correctly—if what we observe is real—it cannot change. He wants to hang on to an idea of reality where the elements, at least, remain. If we see fire, then there is always fire, despite this particular blaze burning out. Although this or that fire may be extinguished, fire is not extinguished.

7. Philosophies of Mixture

Anaxagoras and Empedocles are alike in at least two ways: first, they adhere to the Eleatic principle that being is necessary, that is, it is impossible for being not to be; second, and related to this Eleatic principle, being cannot be generated, nor can it perish, and thus all being is a continual process of mixture and separation.

a. Anaxagoras

Anaxagoras of Clazomenae (c. 500-c. 428 B.C.E.) had what was, up until that time, the most unique perspective on the nature of matter and the causes of its generation and corruption. Closely predating Plato (Anaxagoras died around the time that Plato was born), Anaxagoras left his impression upon Plato and Aristotle, although they were both ultimately dissatisfied with his cosmology (Graham 309-313). He seems to have been almost exclusively concerned with cosmology and the true nature of all that is around us. In fact, some ancient authorities have even called him an atheist (Graham 305). This might be due to his purely naturalistic explanations of the world. He thought, for instance, that the sun, moon, and other heavenly bodies were fiery stones rather than divinities (Graham 297). He is also thought to have explained—more or less correctly—the phenomenon of hail (Graham 303). As we shall see, Anaxagoras called upon his senses to do their work, but also his mind to look beyond what could be seen into the causes for all things.

Before the cosmos was as it is now, it was nothing but a great mixture—everything was in everything. The mixture was so thoroughgoing that no part of it was recognizable, due to the smallness of each thing, and not even any colors were perceptible. He considered matter to be infinitely divisible. That is, because it is impossible for being not to be, there is never a smallest part, but there is always a smaller. If the parts of the great mixture were not infinitely divisible, then we would be left with a smallest part. Since the smallest part could not become smaller, any attempt at dividing it again would presumably obliterate it. The infinitely divisible parts seem to have at least been mixtures of elemental or basic stuffs—earth, wet and dry, hot and cold, and “seeds” (sperma). The nature of these seeds is unclear. They might have been simply the germ of generation or small bits of elemental things. At any rate, these seeds and all other things were mixed together prior to separation (F1-F5).

The separation of the thoroughgoing mixture was generated by a high-speed centrifugal spin (F7). It was the force and speed of the spinning that caused the separating off of each being from the other. However, this separation was not a complete purification or isolation of parts. In fact, beings in the world as we know it, says Anaxagoras, are still mixtures (F8). Everything is still in everything. The difference is that the separating force generated recognizable and individuated beings. So why, then, does gold appear to us as gold and not, say, bone, since everything is in everything? A gold coin is considered to be gold because it has more gold than anything else. The predominant bits, in other words, make up the being as we know it (McKirahan 213). The question of how something small, like a gold coin, could ever hold bits of everything in it goes unanswered in our existing information of Anaxagoras.

The processes of mixture and separation are unceasing. Generation, says Anaxagoras, is mixing, and what appears to be perishing is really separation (F11). This has profound implications for what we consider to be human mortality. Under Anaxagoras’ cooperating principles of mixture and separation, what appears to be change into non-being (death) is impossible. We might surmise that what we call death is nothing more than a separation of these parts (this particular human body) and a mixture back into those parts (the earth). Likewise, a birth cannot be a creation out of nothing. The birth began as a mixture of seeds, which themselves were presumably already mixtures of other things. What comes to be cannot come from what is not. So, generation relies upon what already is. The Anaxagorean world, then, is a continuous play of being. Like the Eleatics, Anaxagoras relies upon the idea that what-is cannot possibly not be, that is, being is necessary. Also like the Eleatics, the senses, for Anaxagoras, do not give us an exhaustively accurate picture of reality—we must rely upon reason to make sense of the world. The difference between Anaxagoras and the Eleatics, however, is that Anaxagoras allows for change and natural processes to take place, without reducing these processes to sensory illusions.

There is one important player in this continuous play of being yet to be mentioned: mind (nous). Although mind can be in some things, nothing else can be in it—mind is unmixed. We recall that, for Anaxagoras, everything is mixed with everything. There is some portion of everything in anything that we identify. Thus, if anything at all were mixed with mind, then everything would be mixed with mind. This mixture would obstruct mind’s ability to rule all else. Mind is in control, and is responsible for having started the spinning of the great mixture, such that individual beings were generated in the process of separation. Everlasting mind—the most pure and fine of all things—is responsible for ordering the world. Thus, Anaxagoras’ world is not a chaotic process of mixture and separation; rather, the processes of mixture and separation are ordered by mind, which is unmixed.

Anaxagoras left his mark on the thought of both Plato and Aristotle, whose critiques of Anaxagoras are similar. In Plato’s Phaedo, Socrates recounts in brief his intellectual history, citing his excitement over his discovery of Anaxagoras’ thought. He was most excited about mind as an ultimate cause of all. Yet, Socrates complains, Anaxagoras made very little use of mind to explain what was best for each of the heavenly bodies in their motions, or the good of anything else. That is, Socrates seems to have wanted some explanation as to why it is good for all things to be as they are (Graham 309-311). Aristotle, too, complains that Anaxagoras makes only minimal use of his principle of mind. It becomes, as it were, a deus ex machina, that is, whenever Anaxagoras was unable to give any other explanation for the cause of a given event, he fell back upon mind (Graham 311-313). It is possible, as always, that both Plato and Aristotle resort here to a straw man of sorts in order to advance their own positions. Indeed, we have seen that Anaxagoras’ principle of mind set the great mixture into motion, and then ordered the cosmos as we know it. This is no insignificant feat.

b. Empedocles

We have an extensive poem from Empedocles of Acragas (near Sicily). He lived from 495-435 B.C.E., overlapping with Anaxagoras and Socrates. Much legend surrounds his life, and it is of course difficult to distinguish fact from fiction. He was a philosophical adherent to a Parmenidean principle of being, that is, what-is cannot not be (Graham 333). Politically, he was an advocate for democracy (Graham 335). Religiously, he seems to have been a Pythagorean, advocating a particular diet (F146-147) and endorsing the doctrine of the transmigration of souls (F124). He was reportedly a physician with a penchant for magic and prophecy. He was supposed to have kept alive a woman who neither breathed nor ate for thirty days (Graham 333). He was reportedly a self-proclaimed god, wearing purple robes, bronze shoes, and a gold wreath. To show his divinity, we are told that he leapt into the volcano at Mount Etna, purifying himself of his body (Graham 337). Legend notwithstanding, we have a substantial amount of his poetry, even if it is at times cryptic.

i. Macrocosm

At its most basic, the cosmos consists of a total of four elements or “roots,” plus two forces that are responsible for combining and separating these elements (F9). Empedocles was the first to name the four elements as earth, air, fire, and water. Love is the force that brings these elements, and the things generated from them, together, while Strife rends them (Graham 347). Empedocles, in Fragment 20 for example, repeatedly refers to a ceaseless cycle of unity from plurality (a movement of Love), and plurality from unity (a movement of Strife). While the names Empedocles uses for these forces might seem to us to carry moral overtones (Love as good and Strife as bad), they appear to be morally neutral for Empedocles—Love and Strife are simply the natural forces that guide the ceaseless motion of being.

Reminiscent of Anxagoras’ mixture, Love holds all things together in perfect unity when it reigns supreme. As Strife begins to hold sway, the unity is pulled apart, presumably producing the sorts of singular beings we see all around us now. Empedocles makes clear, however, that these cycles are not cycles of production out of nothing or perishing into nothing (F11). What-is, or being, never ceases to be, and something cannot come from nothing, nor can anything utterly perish into nothing. Human beings are simply mistaken when we claim that this is how the world works. Empedocles claims to employ the language of birth and death only as a matter of convention, recognizing that the truth is always at hand (F12). Love and Strife are not only responsible for the unification and pluralization of the elements and all things, but they are at play in the world as we know it now. Through an everlasting play of alteration, some things are repelled by one another through Strife, and others are brought together through Love. Some things are fitted for blending, and others are prone to separation (F23). Empedocles likens this to painters mixing colors, some more and some less, in order to create a painting (F24). Likewise, Love and Strife (the painters) bring together and pull apart the primeval elements. Everything that was, is, and will be owes its being to the play of Love and Strife.

How the process of mixture and separation happens is unclear. Empedocles tells us that there is a vortex. When Love is at the middle of the vortex, all things are unified—all things come from their respective places to join together in Love. All the while, Strife is retreating to the outside of the vortex. When Strife gains the strength to do its work, then there is the separation of the elements. First air (or aether) was separated off, then fire, earth separated off next, and then water gushed forth from earth as a result of the pressure of the heavenly rotations. When everything is in complete separation, nothing of our world is recognizable. We are, presumably, now living in a world wherein Love and Strife are both at work, with neither one dominating (McKirahan 269-270).

ii. Microcosm

Despite the predominance of his macrocosmic metaphysics in the surviving works and fragments, Empedocles did reason on the microcosmic and physical level. Different kinds of flesh seem to have been generated from different blends of the four elements (Graham 381). For human beings, perception and intelligence are keener in those whose elements are mixed more equally. Perception and intelligence, in fact, seem proportionate to one another—the more perceptive a being, the more intelligent the being (Graham 403). Moreover, thought seems to be a function of blood circulation, and Empedocles identifies the area around the heart as the area for thought (F115). There may also be a connection here with his theory of respiration. Inhalation occurs when blood retreats from tubes (presumably in the nose) and air fills those tubes. Blood rushing back into the tubes forces the air out (F78). Perception itself seems to occur when certain “effluences” from the perceived thing flow through the medium (air or water, for example) and into the pores of the sense organs. One sense cannot sense the object of another sense because the size and nature of the pores will not allow it. For example, the eyes seem to contain light or fire, and let in a certain amount of light. The ears, however, receive sound when the air outside moves and strikes the inner ear causing an echo (Graham 401).

Sometimes Empedocles describes himself as a fugitive from the gods (F8), and sometimes as himself a god who speaks the truth: “When I come to other flourishing cities I am revered by them, men and women alike” (F120). And again, “But why do I urge these things, as if doing some great deed, if I am superior to mortal men who perish many times?” (F121). At times, it seems he is a fallen god, and that humankind is for the most part fallen from divinity (F8). He seems to have advocated some type of transmigration of souls (F124), with reincarnation being based upon the purity of one’s life (Graham 415). Whether or not dietary and spiritual purity will result in salvation or re-divination is unclear. It does seem, however, that physical and spiritual purity, and intellectual prowess brings us closest to divinity. After a “fast from wickedness” (F150), “they become prophets, singers of hymns, physicians, and leaders among men on earth; afterwards they blossom as gods foremost in honors” (F153). Through it all, Love and Strife dominate and dictate the cycles of being.

8. The Atomists

Ancient atomism began a legacy in philosophical and scientific thought, and this legacy was revived and significantly evolved in modern philosophy. In contemporary times, the atom is not the smallest particle. Etymologically, however, atomos is that which is uncut or indivisible. The ancient atomists, Leucippus and Democritus (c. 5^th century B.C.E.), were concerned with the smallest particles in nature that make up reality—particles that are both indivisible and invisible. They were to some degree responding to Parmenides and Zeno by indicating atoms as indivisible sources of motion, while Parmenides and Zeno considered the world to be indivisible and motionless. Since we have very little from his teacher, Leucippus, the focus here will be on Democritus’ thought.

a. Ontology

Despite the fact that Democritus was supposed to have been a prolific writer (we are told that he wrote approximately seventy books), we now have very little of his writing on atomism (Graham 521-525). What seems clear, however, is that Democritus thought that reality is made up of the full and the empty (void). The full is what-is, and the void is what-is-not (F4). Curiously, however, Democritus said that what-is is no more than what-is-not, that is, they have the same ontological status—each is as real as the other. We might interpret this, along with Aristotle, as meaning that there is body (the full), and there is void, and neither has any higher degree of being than the other. That the void is, is as much an ontological fact as the being of the plenum (Graham 525).

Atoms—the most compact and the only indivisible bodies in nature—are infinite in number, and they constantly move through an infinite void. In fact, motion would be impossible, says Democritus, without the void. If there were no void, the atoms would have nothing through which to move. Atoms take on a variety, perhaps an infinite variety, of shapes. Some are round, others are hooked, and yet others are jagged. They often collide with one another, and often bounce off of one another. Sometimes, though, the shapes of the colliding atoms are amenable to one another, and they come together to form the matter that we identify as the sensible world (F5). This combination, too, would be impossible without the void. Atoms need a background (emptiness) out of which they are able to combine (Graham 531). Atoms then stay together until some larger environmental force breaks them apart, at which point they resume their constant motion (F5). Why certain atoms come together to form a world seems up to chance, and yet many worlds have been, are, and will be formed by atomic collision and coalescence (Graham 551). Once a world is formed, however, all things happen by necessity—the causal laws of nature dictate the course of the natural world (Graham 551-553).

Figure, order, and position (or orientation) serve as the basic marks of distinction among atoms and the things that are (F4). Leucippus and Democritus seem to have identified these distinguishing marks as contour, contact, and turning (or rotation), respectively. These three determine which atoms combine to form elemental bodies like fire and water. It is important to note, however, that atoms themselves are immutable. The sensible world is generated from their combination, and things perish when some force causes the dispersal of the atoms.

b. Perception and Epistemology

Atoms are also responsible for sense perception and thought. Atoms of particular shapes are responsible for particular tastes, for example, round atoms are responsible for sweet tastes, while sour flavors consist of rough and angled atoms (Graham 581). Touch works similarly. Sight, hearing, and smell, however, are in some sense reducible to touch. Sensed objects always have effluences (Graham 585). We can see a tree, for example, because the tree’s atomic form somehow flows from it and makes contact with the atoms making up the eye, and the image of the tree is therefore carried into the eye. This might raise the problem of how effluences from large objects (for example, buildings) can fit into an object as small as the eye, but it could be that the effluences are somehow condensed before entering the eye (McKirahan 332). Democritus’ view of perception has important consequences for his epistemology.

If what we perceive are effluences of things, we do not perceive the things themselves; thus, we cannot know things as they are in themselves, but only as they appear to us (Graham 624). The truth is that there are atoms and void, all else is opinion and convention. It was said above that certain types of atoms are responsible for certain types of tastes, but even here convention and relativity have the final word. When certain atoms from certain objects come into contact with the atoms of different perceivers, what is sweet to one person might taste bitter to another. “By convention bitter, by convention hot, by convention cold, by convention color, but in reality atoms and void” (F32a). More precisely, we thoroughly understand very little, “but we perceive what changes in relation to the disposition of the body as things enter or resist” (F33). Even the human soul is a certain configuration and balance of atoms, and the best we can do is think, even if we cannot know much. In this way, Democritus is seen to be influential for Skepticism (Graham 516), but he is not a thoroughgoing skeptic since he claims that atoms and void can be known.

c. Ethics

While we have scant direct access to Democritus’ physical theory, we have an abundance of his own words regarding ethics. Most of his ethical thought comes to us in pithy aphorisms, with a central theme of contentment and freedom from disturbance. Well-being is founded upon contentment and being undisturbed, and these are attained by doing what is truly beneficial for oneself (Graham 633-635). The measure of what is beneficial is pleasure and pain, or joy and sorrow (F150b). It is clear, however, that Democritus does not condone sensual hedonism. In other words, there seems to be a loftier standard for what counts as pleasurable or joyful. “Those who get pleasure from the belly, when they exceed what is appropriate in food, drink, or sex, all find their pleasures are brief and short-lived, lasting only as long as they are eating or drinking, and their pains many” (F149). Constantly and excessively seeking pleasure in the flesh leads only to pain. By contrast, “reason is accustomed to take joys from itself” (F154). So, it is intellectual pleasure that is truly beneficial, and is the best measure of the best sort of life.

Reminiscent of Heraclitus, Democritus says that the best sort of person sees greater value in thinking than in polymathy (F203), and greater value in good action than in words about goodness (F267-F268). Fools leave things to chance (F105), while the wise person thinks, learns, and plans according to intelligence (F93). Interestingly, there is here a juncture of Democritus’ physical thought and his ethics. If the soul is a configuration of atoms, then teaching, learning, thought, and wisdom can help to refigure the soul and free us from the tyranny of chance (Vlastos 55-57). Pleasure and pain figure significantly into Democritean ethics, but it is pleasure of a higher sort that is constitutive of a good life. Reigning in one’s desires is not sufficient for the best sort of life. “Goodness is not just avoiding wrongdoing but avoiding even the desire for it” (F83). Seeking sensual pleasures leads to a disordered and painful life, while seeking the pleasures of wisdom and understanding furnish us with a harmonious and cheerful life.

9. Diogenes of Apollonia

Scholars do not know about Diogenes’ life. He might have been active in the middle or late fifth century (McKirahan 346). We do know, however, that he resurrected material monism. Like Anaximenes, he posited air as the primary element. Unlike the records and fragments that we have of Anaximenes, Diogenes makes explicit the reason why there must be an essential and common element. “My view, in general, is that all existing things are altered from the same thing and are the same thing” (F2). Evidently, based upon the purported introduction to his text—assuming that what was just quoted immediately succeeds the introduction—Diogenes takes this to be an indisputable starting part (F1). If everything in the cosmos were different, having no nature in common, then nothing would be able to mix with anything else, for example, no plant would be able to grow from the earth. Thus, apparent difference in being is only a variation on the same type of being. The whole cosmos is a constant alteration of one being.

Why must this common or basic being be air? Animals, including human beings, cannot live without respiration, that is, air is essential for life. Following a traditional view, Diogenes considers air to be the soul or life of animals. When respiration ceases, life (the soul) leaves the body (F6). Soul, life, and air are treated synonymously in this context (F10). Moreover, air is also responsible for intelligence (F5). Again, when one ceases to breathe, one is no longer intelligent. As intelligence, air “steers and controls all things;” therefore, air seems to be “God, and to reach everywhere, to arrange all things, and to be present in everything” (F5). Everything partakes of air, but nothing partakes of air in quite the same way, “but air itself and intelligence have many forms” (F5). Sometimes air is “warmer or colder, drier or moister, and more stationary or more lively in motion, and many other differentiations are present in it, including countless differentiations of flavor and color” (F5). The differentiations of air range from the most obvious, to those so subtle we can scarcely imagine.

Diogenes tells us that no two differentiated things can become exactly like one another without becoming the same. “Nothing…of those things that are differentiated one from another is able to become exactly like the other without becoming the same” (F5). In other words, no two things can be identical and simultaneously be distinct from one another. If two or more things are identical, then they are not distinct, but the same thing, and we have no way of distinguishing between them. There are many differences among beings in the cosmos; yet, the underlying nature remains the same. This allows for varying degrees of life and intelligence among beings. Therefore, there is no reason to lump Diogenes in with the traditional and shortsighted view that only human beings have intelligence. Other beings might have intelligence as well, but to varying degrees. Air allows for the eternal being of the cosmos, the differentiation and intelligence of all things.

10. The Sophists and Anonymous Sophistic Texts

As with the terms “cynic” and “stoic,” our modern usage of “sophistry” comes to us from a school of thought, which took its course in approximately fifth century Greece. Again, as with “cynic” and “stoic,” the current connotations of “sophistry” are not without their roots in the historical group of thinkers called Sophists. Yet, as we cannot reduce the thought of the Cynics and Stoics to mere cynicism or apathy, we cannot reduce the thought of the Sophists to mere sophistry. As we have seen, it has been tempting to read the Presocratics through the lens of Plato’s and Aristotle’s thought, and this is no less the case with the Sophists. In fact, two of Plato’s dialogues are named after Sophists, Protagoras and Gorgias, and one is called simply, The Sophist. Beyond this, typical themes of Sophistic thought often make their way into Plato’s work, not the least of which are the similarities between Socrates and the Sophists (an issue explicitly addressed in the Apology and elsewhere). Thus, the Sophists had no small influence on fifth century Greece and Greek thought.

Broadly, the Sophists were a group of itinerant teachers who charged fees to teach on a variety of subjects, with rhetoric as the preeminent subject in their curriculum. A common characteristic among many, but perhaps not all, Sophists seems to have been an emphasis upon arguing for both opposing sides of a case. Thus, these argumentative and rhetorical skills could be useful in law courts and political contexts. However, these sorts of skills also tended to earn many Sophists their reputation as moral and epistemological relativists, which for some was tantamount to intellectual fraud.

a. Protagoras

One of the earliest and most famous Sophists was Protagoras (c. 490-c. 420 B.C.E.). Only a handful of fragments of his thought exist, and the bulk of the remaining information about him found in Plato’s dialogues should be read cautiously. He is most famous for the apparently relativistic statement that human beings are “the measure of all things, of things that are that they are, of things that are not that they are not” (F1b). Plato, at least for the purposes of the Protagoras, reads individual relativism out of this statement. For example, if the pool of water feels cold to Henry, then it is in fact cold for Henry, while it might appear warm, and therefore be warm for Jennifer. This example portrays perceptual relativism, but the same could go for ethics as well, that is, if X seems good to Henry, then X is good for him, but it might be bad in Jennifer’s judgment. The problem with this view, however, is that if all things are relative to the observer/judge, then the idea that all things are relative is itself relative to the person who asserts it. The idea of communication is then rendered incoherent.

On the other hand, Protagoras’ statement could be interpreted as species-relative. That is, the question of whether and how things are, and whether and how things are not, is a question that has meaning (ostensibly) only for human beings. Thus, all knowledge is relative to us as human beings, and therefore limited by our being and our capabilities. This reading seems to square with the other of Protagoras’ most famous statements: “Concerning the gods, I cannot ascertain whether they exist or whether they do not, or what form they have; for there are many obstacles to knowing, including the obscurity of the question and the brevity of human life” (F3). It is implied here that knowledge is possible, but that it is difficult to attain, and that it is impossible to attain when the question is whether or not the gods exist. We can also see here that human finitude is a limit not only upon human life but also upon knowledge. Thus, if there is knowledge, it is for human beings, but it is obscure and fragile.

b. Gorgias

Not far behind Protagoras was Gorgias (c. 485-c. 380 B.C.E.). Perhaps flashier than Protagoras when it came to rhetoric and speech making, Gorgias is known for his sophisticated and poetic style. He is known also for extemporaneous speeches, taking audience suggestions for possible topics upon which he would speak at length. His most well-known work is On Nature, Or On What-Is-Not wherein he, contrary to Eleatic philosophy, sets out to show that neither being nor non-being is, and that even if there were anything, it could be neither known nor spoken. It is unclear whether this work was in jest or in earnest. If it is the former, then it was likely an exercise in argumentation as much as it was a gibe at the Eleatics. If it was in earnest, then Gorgias could be seen as an advocate for extreme skepticism, relativism, or perhaps even nihilism (Graham 725).

On Nature can be summarized as follows. If there is anything, it is either exclusively what-is or what-is-not, or both what-is and what-is-not are. Gorgias then eliminates each of these possibilities, beginning with what-is-not (non-being). If non-being were, then there is a contradiction—it would simultaneously both be and not be. Moreover, if non-being were, then being (what-is) would not be, but then non-being would have the property of being, and being would have the property of non-being, which is absurd. Neither, however, is there being (what-is). If being were, it would have to be everlasting, generated, or both. If it were everlasting, it must have always been, and thus would be unlimited. But if it were unlimited, it would not exist anywhere, since for anything to be, it must be in some place, and this place must be different from that which is in it. Being cannot be generated, because if it were, it would have come to be from something that is (being), or from something that is not (non-being). If the former were the case, the being already was and did not need to be generated. If the latter case, then non-being would have caused being, which would be absurd. Finally, being both everlasting and generated would be a contradiction, since if it were everlasting, it could not have been generated, and vice versa (Graham 741-743).

Moreover, even if there were anything, then it could not be thought or known. In order for being to be the object of thought, then being must be, because if there is no being to be thought, it cannot be thought (Graham 743). Yet, if objects of thought were the same as what-is, then whatever we happen to think (unicorns, centaurs, and so forth) would be, but this is absurd (Graham 745). In addition, if objects of thought were things that are, then we would not be able to think of anything that is not, but since we can think of things that are not (unicorns, centaurs, and so forth), objects of thought cannot be tantamount to things that are.

Finally, even if we could think what-is, we would not be able to communicate it. We perceive objects that are different from us, for example, a table, a song, or a scent. We perceive these things by the respective senses, that is, sight, sound, and smell. We communicate by speech, but speech is not the same thing as what is perceived. “That by which we communicate is speech, but speech is not the subsisting and existing things themselves” (Graham 745). Thus, when we talk about the table, the song, or a particular scent, we do not communicate those very things to each other, but rather we communicate words. Just as, therefore, a sight cannot become a sound and vice versa, a perceived thing cannot become speech and vice versa. Again, whether this was all a mere jocular exercise in argumentation or an earnest stab at truth is unknown. If, however, it was the latter, then we seem to be left speechless in a world that is impossible to understand.

c. Antiphon

Very little is known about Antiphon the Sophist. He seems to have been known for courtroom speeches, dream interpretation, and claiming to heal depression (Graham 789). His views on justice and law are perhaps most salient in the extant fragments. Justice amounts to obeying the laws of the city in which one is a resident, but doing so only when others are present to witness it. When alone, it is better to value “the works of nature. The works of law are factitious, whereas those of nature are necessary” (F46a). The debate between law/custom (nomos) and nature (phusis) was a central theme of philosophical and sophistic thought in ancient Greece. To what degree is law natural? Is morality simply law and custom, or is it natural? Antiphon set law in opposition to nature, although it is unclear what he means by “the works of nature.” Antiphon could be interpreted as an advocate for hedonism. Indeed, things that bring pleasure, he claims, are truly advantageous and beneficial, thus following the course of nature. Things that bring pain, on the other hand, are not advantageous (F46a).

If we do read Antiphon as a hedonist, it would have to be a tempered hedonism that distinguishes between good and bad pleasures. He belittles the pleasures of sexual intercourse, claiming that such pleasures “do not travel alone, but in the company of sorrows and pains” (F51). He also looks with a critical eye towards money making, warning against miserliness. He recounts the story of a man whose hidden store of money was stolen. “His friend told him not to worry, but to put a stone in the same place where the money had been and imagine that he still had the money and he had not lost it. ‘For even when you had it, you did not use it at all; hence, do not feel deprived of it even now’” (F57). The lesson here seems to be that if one is going to make money, then one should use that money, for money stored away becomes superfluous. He also warns against doing evil to one’s neighbor, since this will necessarily incur evil for the perpetrator (F61). Moreover, “nothing is worse for men than a lack of discipline,” so we should raise our children well, and when they grow up, great changes will not overwhelm them (F64). So if we are to read Antiphon as a hedonist, then it is a hedonism that works towards what is truly advantageous for oneself—a hedonism tempered by practical wisdom.

d. Prodicus

Prodicus of Ceos (c. 465-c. 395 B.C.E.), like most Sophists, worked as teacher and rhetorician. Like Protagoras, he presented a challenge to theistic thinking, but took this challenge further. The Greeks and Egyptians tend to consider all beneficial things to be gods. “Sun, moon, rivers, springs, and in general everything that benefits our life the ancients considered gods on account of the benefit accruing from them, just as the Egyptians make the Nile a god…” (F3c). This, of course, is not enough evidence to suggest that Prodicus was an atheist (although that word was broader for the ancients than for us, referring to those who hold no belief in gods, and to those who hold unorthodox beliefs in the gods), but it certainly represents a challenge to common theistic notions that the gods are independent of our judgments about them.

Plato portrays Prodicus as a specialist in correct diction. In the Cratylus, Socrates says,

The study of words is not a minor undertaking. If I had heard Prodicus’ fifty-drachma lecture, which provides the student complete instruction on this subject, as he himself advertises, nothing would keep me from telling you straightaway the whole truth about correct diction. But alas I have not heard it, but only the one-drachma lecture. (Graham 847)

This humorous passage is typical of Plato’s emphasis on the Sophist’s method of charging large sums of money for instruction. In fact, in the Hippias Major Plato says of Prodicus that “it is amazing how much money he took in by putting on demonstrations and instructing the young men” (Graham 843). As Graham points out, however, “The ability to make fine discriminations of words is important to rhetoric, and we should remind ourselves that there were no dictionaries in the classical age, and treatises such as Prodicus wrote were the first essays in lexicography and diction” (860). Thus, while Plato treat Prodicus with more respect than other Sophists, we should be aware that his agenda is in part to contrast Prodicus with Socrates, who claimed to teach nothing and to charge nothing for his discussions (compare with the Apology), and that Prodicus’ thought might have been far more important that Plato considered it to be.

e. Anonymous Texts

Two anonymous texts called the Anonymous Iamblichi and the Dissoi Logoi represent different ends of the spectrum of sophistic thought. The Anonymous Iamblichi is primarily an ethical work, dealing with reputation, virtue, and law. It exhorts the audience toward an education in virtue from an early age, because “a long time’s familiarity with a thing at length strengthens the practice, while a short time is not able to accomplish this” (Graham 865). Such a life requires self-control, especially an indifference to money, “by which everyone is corrupted” (Graham 867). The love for money is, for most people, merely a symptom of their fear, that is, fear of death, disease, old age, and so forth. These things can presumably be held at bay, so the masses think, by money. Rivalries and competition with others are also motives for greed. Thus, law is needed to ensure that money remains a good for the entire community, and moreover so that the community does not fall into dissolution. Lawlessness and greed beget tyranny. Thus, virtue and law are intimately connected.

The Dissoi Logoi, or Twofold Arguments, is a sophistic exercise in arguing for the relativity of things like good and bad, right and wrong, the just and the unjust, truth and falsity, and so forth. What is good in one situation might be bad in another, or good for one person, but bad for another. For example, “sickness is bad for the sick, but good for the physicians. Further, death is bad for those who die, but good for undertakers and makers of tombs” (Graham 879). The relativity of right and wrong to cultural sensibilities is also emphasized. “For example, it is right among the Spartans for girls to exercise naked and appear in public in clothing without sleeves and blouses; but it is wrong to the Ionians” (Graham 883). Again, “Among the Thracians it is a mark of beauty for girls to have tattoos; for everyone else tattoos are a punishment for a crime” (Graham 883). The problem with cultural relativism is that, when taken to its extreme, we cannot claim that certain activities are universally wrong or right, but only wrong or right relative to each culture. Thus, we may see that the arguments in the text are generally bad, but we have no reason to believe that they were meant to be good. The Dissoi Logoi might be emblematic of sophistical exercises at the time, but not necessarily of the more sophisticated of the Sophists.

11. Conclusion

From Thales to the Sophists, we see much variation in thought, as well as in the style and presentation of those different ways of thinking. Yet, we also see common threads running throughout Presocratic thought. On one hand, there is a tendency to think of the cosmos on its own terms. This new way of thinking often takes its course away from the confines of traditional, theocentric thought. Yet, on the other hand, many of these thinkers reformulated and reconceived God, the gods, and divinity. There is also a push towards ethics and thinking about human affairs and the best sorts of ways for human beings to live. Behind it all—the backdrop, as it were—is a preference for free, rational thought.

12. References and Further Reading

The lists of primary and secondary sources are very abbreviated. The secondary sources are generally accessible for non-specialists, and a good starting place for further research into the Presocratics. Some of these books also have extensive lists of references for further reading.

a. Primary Sources

Diels, Hermann and Walther Kranz. Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker: Griechisch und Deutsch. Berlin: Weidmannsche Buchhandlung, 1910. Print.
- This is the first and most traditionally used collection of Presocratic fragments and testimonies. This edition has the fragments in Greek with German translations. The book is no longer in print, and while it is often still cited in most scholarship, it is not the work cited in this article.
Graham, Daniel W. The Texts of Early Greek Philosophy: The Complete Fragments and Selected Testimonies of the Major Presocratics. 2 vols. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
- This is the first collection of the Presocratic fragments and testimonies published with the original Greek and its corresponding English translations. It is the work cited in this text. Graham offers a short commentary on the fragments, as well as references for further reading for each thinker. He has organized by topic the fragments for each thinker, and labels the fragments with an F, followed by the number of the fragment. That is how the fragments have been cited in this article. Testimonies, as well as Graham’s commentary, are cited by page numbers.

b. Secondary Sources

Barnes, Jonathan. The Presocratic Philosophers. London and New York: Routledge, 1982.
- A classic work with interpretations of the Presocratics.
Burnet, John. Early Greek Philosophy. London: A&C. Black Ltd., 1930.
- Another classic work with interpretations of the Presocratics.
Long, A.A. ed. The Cambridge Companion to Early Greek Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
- A collection of sixteen essays by some of the foremost scholars on Presocratic thought. The essays are generally accessible, but some are more appropriate for specialists in the field.
McKirahan, Richard D. Philosophy Before Socrates: An Introduction with Texts and Commentaries. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1994.
- This is a very good book for non-specialists and specialists alike interested in further commentary on the Presocratics. The book contains most fragments for most thinkers and reasonable explanations and interpretations of each. There is also a helpful chapter at the end of the book on the nomos-phusis debate. The text includes a fairly extensive section for suggestions for further reading.
Vlastos, Gregory. “Ethics and Physics in Democritus.” Philosophical Review, vol. 2, 578-592, 1994.
- This article is technical, but offers insight into the connection between Democritean physics and ethics, and was cited in the current overview.

Author Information

Jacob Graham
Email: jgraham@bridgewater.edu
Bridgewater College
U. S. A.

Armed Humanitarian Intervention

Humanitarian intervention is a use of military force to address extraordinary suffering of people, such as genocide or similar, large-scale violation of basic of human rights, where people’s suffering results from their own government’s actions or failures to act. These interventions are also called “armed interventions,” or “armed humanitarian interventions,” or “humanitarian wars. They are interventions to protect, defend, or rescue other people from gross abuse attributable to their own government. The armed intervention is conducted without the consent of the offending nation. Those intervening militarily are one or more states, or international organizations.

The need to consider and understand the many issues involved in humanitarian interventions have been borne home by the fact that these interventions has become more complex and more common since the 1980s, and because of the consequences of non-intervention, such as in the Rwandan genocide of 1994, in which nearly one million people were killed in less than three months. Humanitarian interventions raise many complex, inter-related issues of international law, international relations, political philosophy, and ethics.

This article considers moral issues of whether or when humanitarian intervention is justified, using just war theory as a framework. Section One addresses general characterizations of humanitarian interventions and commonly discussed cases, as well as some definitional or terminological issues. Section Two examines the question: What humanitarian emergencies rise to a level at which intervention is appropriate? Section Three presents just war theory as a common framework for justifying humanitarian interventions. Section Four considers some other, related issues that may support or challenge armed interventions: international law, state sovereignty, the selectivity problem, political realism, post-colonialist and feminist critiques, and pacifism.

What is a Humanitarian Intervention?
The Threshold Condition for Intervention
Justifying Intervention: Just War Theory
Other Issues and Challenges
References and Further Reading

1. What is a Humanitarian Intervention?

The term ‘humanitarian intervention’ came into common use during the 1990s to describe the use of military force by states or international organizations in response to genocides, “ethnic cleansing,” and other horrors suffered by peoples at the hands of their own governments. But cases of armed interventions are not new. Several times during the nineteenth century European powers intervened militarily in various provinces of the Ottoman Empire to protect Christian enclaves from massacre or oppression (Bass). Following World War II there were many military interventions sometimes dubiously described as ‘humanitarian’, including by the United States in Latin America and France’s 1979 use of military force in its former colony, the Central African Republic. Other cases remain notable foci of scholarly discussion: India’s 1971 military intervention in East Pakistan, now Bangladesh; Vietnam’s 1979 intervention into Cambodia; and in the same year, Tanzania’s intervention into Uganda. Later cases include uses of military force to protect Iraqi Kurds, and interventions in Somalia, Haiti, Liberia, and Sierra Leone, among many others. The 1994 genocide in Rwanda focused attention on the consequences of failing to intgervening, because external military force was not deployed to prevent the killing of nearly 1 million people in just three months of violence.

Philosophic attention to humanitarian interventions is not new. The seventeenth century jurist, Hugo Grotius, is credited with originating the modern conception of armed humanitarian intervention. In his classic work of 1646, The Law of War and Peace, he includes an entire chapter, “On Undertaking War on Behalf of Others,” and writes:

If a tyrant … practices atrocities towards his subjects, which no just man can approve, the right of human social connection is not cut off in such a case …. It would not follow that others may not take up arms for them.

Some argue that the earlier “just war” tradition’s appeals to natural law, in effect, permitted humanitarian interventions. Classic theorists like St. Augustine, Thomas Aquinas, and Vitoria saw a just war as aimed at the justice of punishing wrongdoing by other political leaders, which, some argue, would permit intervening against governments’ mistreating their own people (Johnson). In the nineteenth century John Stuart Mill appealed to the importance of communal self-determination in providing consequentialist arguments limiting armed interventions. In the early 21^st century, Michael Walzer entertained armed interventions as justified responses to acts “that shock the moral conscience of mankind” (Just and Unjust Wars, 107).

A humanitarian intervention is a form of foreign interventionism using military force. Consider this paradigm characterization of humanitarian interventions as:

the threat or use of force across state borders by a state (or group of states) aimed at preventing or ending widespread and grave violations of the fundamental human rights of individuals others than its own citizens, without the permission of the state within whose territory force is applied. (Holzgrefe, 18)

Humanitarian interventions are distinguished from other forms of interfering with another state’s activities, such as humanitarian aid, sanctions of various kinds, altering of diplomatic relationships, monitoring arms treaties or elections of human rights practices, and peace-keeping. A humanitarian intervention does not require the consent of the target state: it is a form of coercion. The government is deemed culpable in the suffering of others that is to be prevented or ended. Those suffering and the target of the rescue effort are not nationals of the intervening states: humanitarian interventions are, as Nicholas Wheeler puts it, about “saving strangers.” Definitions are typically neutral as to whether the intervention is unilateral or multi-lateral and as to whether it is authorized (for example, by the United Nations) or unauthorized. Finally, the interveners’ purpose is rescue, defense, or protection of those who are suffering due to their own government’s actions or failures. The purpose is not conquest, territorial control, support of insurrectionist or secessionist movements, regime change, or constitutional change of government.

Humanitarian intervention vary in terms of motivations of a state in using military force. Some stricter definitions require a purity or primacy of intention in the use of armed force: militarily addressing the suffering of others for reasons of national interest, then, by definition, are not humanitarian interventions. Other definitions attend more to the effects of intervening than to motivations. These definitional disputes involve evaluating actions on behalf of others. The issue, then, may be more a matter of how much normative work is to be done by definition rather than by a separable ethical judgment of the actions themselves. A deontologist like Kant or Aquinas, for example, might maintain that genuine instances of a morally worthy act require a purely humanitarian intention, while a utilitarian like Mill might insist that the motive matters not at all to what the act is or to the act’s morality, but only to our judgment of the actor. Such definitional issues also intersect with doctrines of political realism as explanation of states’ behavior (In IEP, see “Political Realism” and “Interventionism” (sec 3b).). If all state action is explained by national self-interest, typically understood in terms of national security, military or economic power, or material well-being, then, all states’ actions are necessarily motivated by self-interest, actions motivated solely or primarily by humanitarian considerations are precluded, and there are, by these stricter definitions, no genuine examples of humanitarian interventions (see IV.d below).

Another terminological consideration is reflected in the work of the 2001 International Commission on Intervention and State Sovereignty (ICISS), The Responsibility to Protect. The Report title is a preferred term because it avoids militarizing what is a humanitarian action and it avoids the connoted approval of military action by labeling it ‘humanitarian’ (sec. 1.39-1.41). Indeed, these semantic concerns are grounded ultimately in re-conceiving state sovereignty not as a right not to be transgressed by outsiders, but as a duty to protect the people of a state and, if needed, people of other states (sec. 1.35). Many differences of definition about what constitutes a humanitarian intervention reflect varying views about the normative merits and justifications for using force to address the suffering of others at the hands of their own government.

2. The Threshold Condition for Intervention

Even proponents of humanitarian intervention advocate very limited circumstances where such uses of military force are justifiable. In particular, proponents attempt to specify minimum, threshold conditions in terms of the severity, scale, and kinds of human suffering necessary (but not sufficient) to justify intervention. For example, seeing interventions as rescues, Michael Walzer specifies situations of “massive violations of human rights” where “what is at stake is the bare survival or the minimal liberty” of a people (Just and Unjust Wars, 101). The ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect, specifies a threshold condition in terms of “large scale loss of life, with genocidal intent or not,” or “large scale ‘ethnic cleansing’, … whether carried out by killing, forced expulsion, acts of terror or rape” (sec 4.19). In a similar vein, Nicholas Wheeler speaks of supreme humanitarian emergencies, where there are “extraordinary acts of killing and brutality” beyond the “abuse of human rights that tragically occurs on a daily basis” and that are of a magnitude and severity that “the only hope of saving lives depends on outsiders coming to the rescue” (34). Common among specifications of threshold conditions are requirements that the most basic of human rights are being violated, that the human suffering is widespread and systematic, and that the government bears some culpability for what is happening to its people. Interventions, then, are justifiable only to address the most egregious violations; the threshold conditions in the target state must be those that, as Walzer put it, “shock the conscience of mankind.”

Specifications of threshold conditions raise several issues. A specification of the conditions of suffering will be inherently vague. How many rights violations or how many horrors or how extraordinary must the violations be in order to satisfy the threshold condition for armed intervention? A second issue involves the invoked notion of basic human rights. It is commonly held in Western ethical literature that all human rights are equally important (See “Human Rights” in IEP). Attention to violations of basic human rights, however, presupposes a hierarchy of such rights for all humans. Allen Buchanan, for example, includes significant civil and political rights as well as “the right to resources for subsistence” in a list of basic human rights (Justice, 129); in The Law of Peoples, John Rawls identifies “a special class of urgent rights” that includes ethnic groups’ right to “security from mass murder and genocide” (79). Some have argued that negative rights (for example, not to be tortured, not to be raped, not to be killed) are more basic and more important than positive rights (for example, to basic welfare requirements of food, clothing, shelter), though, following Henry Shue’s analysis in Basic Rights (Princeton, 1980), not all accept such a distinction or hierarchy. There are disagreements about the extent to which basic human rights are the rights of individuals or may include rights of collectives, or “group rights,” such as rights to collective self-determination, group survival, and cultural integrity. International human rights law introduces yet other hierarchies which may be relevant. By international treaty the right not to be tortured is uniquely absolute; only a few human rights are not to be derogated even if the nation’s survival is at stake, while during declared public emergencies a state can set aside other human rights (International Covenant on Civil and Political Rights, Article 4.1-4.2); and the legal obligations of states to respect civil and political rights are much stronger than for social, economic, or cultural rights (cf. International Covenant on Civil and Political Rights, Article 2, and International Covenant on Social, Economic, and Cultural Rights, Article 2).

Government culpability must satisfy certain threshold conditions. Human suffering and rights violations, even when widespread and systematic, may be perpetrated by the government itself, as, for example, during the Holocaust in Nazi Germany; the late 1970s “killing fields” of Cambodia’s Khmer Rouge regime; or 1990s “ethnic cleansings” conducted by the Bosnian Serbs in the former Yugoslavia. Or government may be complicit, indirectly fostering human rights violations by providing funding, arms, or logistical support to private militias, by coordinating attacks on people through control of the communication infrastructure, or by inciting action through propaganda and other forms of media control. This was the case in the Rwandan genocide of 1994 and during the violent campaigns by the janjaweed in Darfur, Sudan, beginning about 2004. Or state involvement may be more akin to negligence, incompetence, or inability to govern. In inept or failed states, the government does not maintain effective control of territory and people. This often leads to widespread violations of human rights by non-state actors. Somalia was a “failed state” in 1990. In much of the country, people lived in fear of armed militias while the central government could not assert effective control. The United States intervened militarily. The government culpability necessary to satisfy threshold conditions can range from perpetrator to failed state. Furthermore, situations often mask or complicate whether threshold conditions are satisfied. Widespread and systemic human suffering often occurs amidst or accompanying domestic insurrections, counter-insurgency campaigns, revolutions, liberation efforts, partition or secession battles, or civil wars, for example. In Darfur, the government of the Sudan claims to have been conducting a counter-insurgency campaign; the Bosnian War can be seen as part of a secession or partition battle; the Rwandan genocide occurred in the context of a civil war and struggle for power in the country. The challenges here are both epistemic and conceptual. Satisfying threshold conditions of suffering may depend on the specific domestic contexts in which people and government find themselves.

Though most discussions of humanitarian interventions specify threshold conditions in terms of human rights violations, other kinds of characterizations of the relevant human suffering are used by others. There are justificatory implications for these kinds of differences. A characterization in terms of human rights readily suggests deontological justifications for armed interventions. For any genuine right, others are bound by correlative duties. Even if the primary correlative duty for human rights falls on a national government, some argue that the correlative duties of others include obligations to respect, protect, and enforce human rights whenever the primary duty-holder fails to do so (these are sometimes called “default duties”). Thus, armed interventions are justified partially as discharging (default) duties correlated with the human rights that are being violated in the target state. On the other hand, some see armed interventions as aimed at reducing human suffering, regardless of whether there are violations of specific human rights. As mentioned above, the ICISS Report specifies “large scale loss of life” or “large scale ‘ethnic cleansing’.” Such a characterization of threshold conditions suggests a direct consequentialism at work. Some feminists have argued that social oppression of women constitutes threshold conditions for forceful interventions (Cudd). Uses of armed force, of course, have costs for human suffering, too. The idea is that sometimes the use of deadly force is justifiable to save lives and reduce total human suffering.

Another development relevant to interventions is the concept of human security. The notion of multi-faceted security, then, applies not only to states (as in “national security”), but also to people. The concept of human security is defined broadly both in terms of causes and kinds of human suffering. For example, the ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect, describes the security of people as

their physical safety, their economic and social well-being, respect for their dignity and worth as human beings, and the protection of their human rights and fundamental freedoms. (sec. 2.21)

Furthermore, valuing human security requires addressing “threats to life, health, livelihood, personal safety and human dignity” without regard to the sources of these threats, whether governmental, man-made, or natural. The United Nations Development Program has adopted a similarly broad definition. With respect to threshold conditions for humanitarian interventions, using the broad concept of human security has some advantages. It eliminates the need to establish target state culpability for its peoples’ suffering; and, in fact, often some government action or inaction at least partially explains even famines, and the effects of droughts or earthquakes. Determining whether threshold conditions are satisfied is also simpler without the need to apply specific legal or moral categories such as basic human rights or genocide. Furthermore, it is argued, the concept calls attention to preventing humanitarian emergencies from emerging, instead of focusing so much on armed interventions as reactions to emergencies. But the breadth and scope of the concept also is challenging for use as a threshold condition for humanitarian interventions. Virtually any kind of widespread, systematic suffering or threat to people becomes a security issue possibly addressed by an armed intervention: many situations around the world thereby satisfy a requisite condition for justifiable intervention. The concept’s breadth erases or postpones justifying priorities, both by states trying to address their own peoples’ needs and by states or organizations readying to rescue those not secure under their own governments. As a threshold condition, the breadth of the concept of human security only make more common problems with properly selecting which of many humanitarian emergencies warrant others’ use of armed force to alleviate human suffering (see IV. C. below). For these and other reasons, the concept of human security is not often invoked in articulating threshold conditions for interventions.

3. Justifying Intervention: Just War Theory

The satisfaction of specified threshold conditions and state culpability requirements are only necessary conditions for morally justifying humanitarian interventions. There is a paradoxical quality in using deadly force to prevent or end violence against others. How can it be that war is warranted in the name of saving lives? A common response employs the “domestic analogy,” seeing states as analogous to persons. As matter of morality and legality, individuals have rights of defense that permit using deadly force as proportionate response to unavoidable, imminent threats to our own lives or to the lives of others, whether the endangered people are kin, akin, or strangers. By analogy, then, states have not only rights of self-defense if attacked, but rights to use deadly force in defense of others. A second analogy also sees states as persons. Given that individuals, in some circumstances, ought to perform beneficent acts such as “interposing to protect the defenseless against ill usage” and “saving a fellow-creature’s life,” to use John Stuart Mill’s phrasing, so states sometimes are right to rescue others being poorly treated under their own government. More direct arguments see a connection between taking universal human rights seriously and acting rightly with deadly force when this force is necessary to defend or protect those rights. Direct consequentialist arguments appeal to the morality of preventing extraordinary suffering when possible, that is, if and when there is opportunity and capability that is not more costly in its effects on human lives than not acting with deadly force. Thus, there need not be inconsistency or paradox in saving lives by using armed force, at least in some grave circumstances.

Discussions of whether humanitarian interventions are justified take seriously both the moral pull of extreme humanitarian emergencies that “shock the conscience of mankind” and a moral reticence about using deadly force even to save lives. Regardless of the kind of moral theory employed – direct or indirect utilitarianism, natural law principles, or correlative duties of human rights, for example – justifying an armed intervention involves addressing a host of questions: Who or what has the authority to intervene? Is an intervention likely to succeed, or be worth the costs, on balance? Are there not non-military measures available to address the human suffering? What exactly is the purpose of the military action and how are armed forces to conduct themselves in defending, protecting, or rescuing others from their own government? Such questions are, in fact, paralleled in the structure of just war theory, or jus bellum, and its traditional duality: jus ad bellum, or the conditions requisite for justifiably going to war, and jus in bello, the principles governing proper conduct of war. Just war theory—especially jus ad bellum—is the framework for making moral decisions about humanitarian interventions. For example, in Saving Strangers, Nicholas Wheeler says “requirements that an intervention must meet… are derived from the Just War tradition” (33-34). The 2001 ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect, summarizes “criteria for military intervention… under the following six headings: right authority, just cause, right intention, last resort, proportional means and reasonable prospects” (sec. 4.15-4.16ff.). Michael Walzer defends interventions in his classic work, Just and Unjust Wars, and again prominently in the Preface to the Third Edition of that book. Many critics challenge the suitability, adaptations, and implications of just war theory for humanitarian interventions. So, proponents, opponents, and cautionary discussants employ just war theory in exploring the moral merits of humanitarian interventions.

There are additional reasons for relying on the jus bellum framework. Humanitarian interventions resemble wars, are even sometimes referred to as “humanitarian wars.” Military force is used in another nation’s territory in order to rescue, protect, or defend people. The most basic moral question of modern just war theory is delineating what states are permitted to do through the use of military force to those outside their borders and for achieving what aims or purposes. Second, the classic just war tradition includes attention to what are now called humanitarian interventions, at least as far as the cause and purpose of such military action. Morally justifying humanitarian interventions, then, is often explored by interpreting, applying or adapting the standards for judging whether going to war is justified; receiving the most attention are issues of just cause and right authority for interventions. Other major facets of just war theory and its tradition – jus in bello, and jus post bellum – are also employed, though less prominently, as there has been much less philosophic attention to the conduct of interventions or what follows the use of armed force to rescue, protect, or defend others.

a. Justifying the Recourse to War (jus ad bellum) and Interventions

The jus ad bellum framework of just war theory identifies about a half dozen considerations relevant to justifying the recourse to war. All the ad bellum requirements must be satisfied for war to be justified. So, the use of armed force for humanitarian purposes is justified only if all six ad bellum requirements are satisfied. Three of these considerations – last resort, likelihood of success, and proportionality – are consequentialist requirements. Proportionality, for example, requires that the benefits of military action are not overshadowed by the inevitable costs, destruction, and other negative effects. Likelihood of success involves estimating the consequences of waging war, specifically, the probability that the war’s aims will be accomplished. Last resort captures the idea that war is worth its effects only if non-military means are not available for success: recourse to war is justifiable only if alternative, pacific courses of action will not achieve the morally acceptable aims of war (tied to a “just cause”). The other three jus ad bellum considerations – just cause, right authority, right intention – appear to be deontological, rooted in natural law, for example, human rights, or other normative, non-consequentialist principles. Pivotal among jus ad bellum considerations is the notion of “just cause” for war. Adapting the jus bellum framework to humanitarian interventions brings a mixture of deontological and consequentialist reasoning to the issues, with the satisfactions of threshold conditions – a “just cause” – being central to justifying the use of armed force to address human suffering.

i. Just Cause

In the just war tradition, just cause has long been among the basic considerations in determining whether the recourse to military force is justified. St. Thomas Aquinas’s famous first articulation prominently includes “just cause” as a requirement, as do virtually all subsequent contributors to the tradition. The idea is that certain circumstances rightly prompt and contribute significantly to a justification for a war. Furthermore, the just war tradition, just war theory, and international law today acknowledge that armed attack by another justifies going to war: wars of reactive self-defense clearly satisfy the “just cause” requirement. As applied to humanitarian interventions, then, the issue is whether a “just cause” includes defense of others, or as many state it, whether threshold conditions for intervention are a “just cause” for a state or states using armed force to rescue, protect, or defend other people.

Supporters of justifiable interventions call attention to features of the just war tradition. As noted in sec. I, Hugo Grotius explicitly acknowledges that a government’s subjects suffering atrocities permits others “take up arms for them.” A dominant theme of the classic just war tradition is that punishable wrongs are a just cause for war, even if the intervening party has not been wronged. James Turner Johnson, for example, suggests that traditional just war theory is not based on a presumption against war, but on a presumption against injustice: a just war is not only a justified war, it is a war waged for justice. The interpretative contention, then, is that only in the early 21^st century has just war thinking come to be so restrictive about “just cause” as to allow only for wars of self-defense.

Aside from interpretations of the just war tradition, a number of fundamental issues are at stake in debates about the substantive content of the “just cause” requirement as it pertains to humanitarian interventions. One matter deals with the kind of moral foundations presupposed for just war theory itself. Some appeal to transnational ethical norms about rights or duties, whether expressed as universal natural law principles about rights of defense or duties correlated with universal human rights. So, sometimes also coupled with the “domestic analogy” between persons and states described above, the ethical arguments turn on whether there is a natural law duty to rescue or render aid, a (default) duty to enforce human rights, or a transnational right to defend others conjoined to the uncontroversial self-defense right of states. Discussions often challenge the adequacy of the analogies: states seem much unlike individuals when it comes to ethical norms. Also, legal positivists, especially, find the appeal to natural law more than suspect, and positive international law is explicit only about states’ right to self-defense (see section IV.A. below). Others discuss the “just cause” requirement by invoking different conceptions of the world community. At one extreme, the world community is inter-national, a community of nations or sovereign states relating to one another by mutual agreement with one another; an opposing conception thinks of a global ethical order of trans-national norms about people (that is, human rights). In effect, some of the debate is couched in broad issues of how state-centered or people-centered the world ethical order is to be.

ii. Right Intention and Right Authority

Intention, or purpose, and authority have both been basic considerations in determining whether the recourse to military force is justified. Aquinas’s first articulation of just war theory includes “right intention” and “right authority” as requirements. Matters of intention, or purpose, have since not always been accorded independent status. For example, Grotius does not list intention as a separate requirement for justly going to war, and later versions of just war theory often seem to conflate “right intention” and “just cause.” In the application of just war theory to humanitarian interventions, however, the “right intention” requirement figures prominently in many discussions. As noted in sec. I, the issue emerges as a matter of definition, and some maintain purity of motive is essential to being a humanitarian intervention. Others note that the classic just war tradition mostly excludes certain aims or purposes for going to war – “not out of greed or cruelty, but for the sake of peace, to restrain the evildoers and assist the good,” writes Aquinas. So, the classic “right intention” requirement, it is argued, allows for a plurality of motives for waging war so long as excluded are such aims as conquest, territory, control of natural resources, and vengeance. When applied to humanitarian interventions, then, use of military force satisfies the “right intention” requirement if, among a plurality of motives, a primary purpose is addressing the widespread and systematic human suffering (Wheeler, 37-40).

The classic just war tradition emphasizes issues about the locus of authority to deploy military force. Modern just war theory typically presumes that states are the proper “right authority.” The advent of non-state war-makers – terrorist organizations, liberation movements, insurgencies, and insurrections, for example – raises interesting questions for this jus ad bellum issue. In applying the just war theory framework to humanitarian interventions, however, the “right authority” requirement is prominently discussed, often in the context of international law and institutions. Under the United Nations Charter, except for wars of reactive self-defense, a state is explicitly permitted to employ military force against another only with Security Council authorization to “preserve international peace and security” (see IV.A. below). For this and other reasons much discussion is devoted to whether interventions are justifiable when unauthorized by the United Nations (and thus, illegal).

There also are some ethical dimensions to “right authority” questions about humanitarian interventions. In as much as impartiality is an ethical norm, there may be a strong presumption for only centrally authorized or multi-lateral interventions being justifiable. In as much as speed of response to a supreme humanitarian emergency saves more lives and a single state can be more decisive, there is support for permitting unilateral and unauthorized interventions. In as much as there are moral objections to the current, restrictive international law of force, states’ or international organizations’ unauthorized interventions may have some moral merit as a way of reforming the law or as a justified cost of promoting basic justice or protecting basic human rights. In as much as the quality of the intervention is affected by characteristics of the intervening party – suitable military capability, quality command and control infrastructures, experience, a good human rights record – perhaps only certain states or organizations satisfy the “right authority” requirement for justifiable humanitarian interventions.

iii. Likelihood of Success, Last Resort, and Proportionality

Three additional jus ad bellum requirements also must be satisfied for a war to be justified. As applied to justifying an armed intervention, then, using military force to address a humanitarian emergency must be likely to succeed. As in just war theory, the principle of likely success presupposes a sufficiently clear understanding of “just cause” and “right intention.” For humanitarian interventions, then, success is at least preventing or stopping the widespread violence and suffering that constitutes “just cause” and defines the purpose of the incursion. If such success is not likely, then the intervention is not justified. Aside from the inherent vagueness of the standard, estimating the likelihood of a successful intervention is complicated, a function of at least two general factors (among others): the military capabilities and effectiveness of the intervener, and the capabilities of the target state or other forces involved in the violence that constitutes “just cause.” The latter can be further complicated by the need to estimate secondary effects: for example, whether an armed intervention may invoke target state allies’ military mobilization and responses, with looming possibilities of a larger conflict. As even proponents of intervention admit, some interventions will not succeed and “some human beings simply cannot be rescued except at an unacceptable cost” (International Commission, sec. 4.41). It also follows that inequality of military power among states is normatively significant. A humanitarian intervention is not likely to succeed against large, powerful states, like China or Russia, while success is more likely for emergencies occurring in smaller, weaker nations; furthermore, large, militarily powerful states are more likely to be successful interveners than smaller, weaker nations or organizations. Thus, inequalities of states’ military power create inequalities of immunity and vulnerability to justifiable armed interventions; and power differentials create inequalities of moral right, responsibility, or duty to intervene in response to human suffering around the world.

The “last resort” requirement expresses the general idea that war is worth its deadly, destructive effects only if every non-military alternative will not work to achieve the same ends (that is, what counts as success, which is linked to “just cause” and “right intention”). Though the general idea is more than plausible, specifying the “last resort” requirement precisely is controversial because one can almost always argue that not all non-military avenues have failed: more diplomacy or negotiation almost always seems possible. Indeed, on a literal construal of the requirement, no war ever satisfies this jus ad bellum requirement. On the other hand, in law and morality, reactive wars of self-defense are justified, even though non-military means of resolution, in fact, are not attempted after an armed attack occurs. So, justifying a war as a last resort depends on at least two features of the specific situation: time, or urgency of action, and likelihood that non-military measures would succeed.

Supreme humanitarian emergencies often exhibit urgency akin to that of a state facing a surprise attack or invasion: if lives are to be saved and people to be rescued, there is not time for peaceful pressure, coercion, diplomacy, negotiation, sanctions, or boycotts to work effectively. The Rwandan genocide of 1994 vividly illustrated this sort of urgency. Aside from temporal considerations, intervening as a last resort involves assessing the likelihood of any non-military means being effective, but not necessarily actually implementing or trying all those means. This leads to typically counterfactual formulations of the “last resort” requirement, as illustrated by the ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect.

[Last Resort] … does not necessarily mean that every [non-military] option must literally have been tried and failed…. But it does mean that there must be reasonable grounds for believing that … if the measure had been attempted it would not have succeeded. (sec. 4.37)

This way of proceeding points to a second temporal feature of war as last resort. Some opponents of intervention bemoan the lack of infrastructure, for example, that would enrich and support effective, non-military means of defending and protecting basic human rights. The idea is that more could have been done to prevent horrors and to be ready to react non-militarily when emergencies do emerge. An issue here, then, is the time framework for constructing possible means of addressing the emergency. A circumscribed last resort principle requires assessing the effectiveness of those means available at the time of the emergency, however rich or limited they may be. A broader last resort principle seems to deny armed force is a last resort if more could have been done in the past to enrich the availability of effective non-military means today. This broader construal, however, seems to conflate a call to build better prevention mechanisms with assessing military and non-military options available when supreme humanitarian emergencies actually occur and decisions have to be made.

The jus ad bellum proportionality requirement is often labeled “(macro-)proportionality,” to distinguish it from the in bello proportionality, or (micro-)proportionality principle. The ad bellum principle addresses the general concern that the deaths, destruction, and other negative effects of war must be balanced by its benefits (that is, success). In considering war’s effects the proportionality principle precludes excessive partiality. So, a war’s effects on everyone are to be counted – civilians and combatants, whether friend or foe or neutrals civilians. All death, injury, and destruction are to be considered, and relevant effects must not be limited to one’s own national interest and do include the international community. This breadth of considerations brings to the fore difficult matters of the commensurablity of values and, as for any consequentialist argument, epistemic challenges related to the causal impacts of action. Yet some rough estimates of wars’ costs and benefits can be and have been plausibly made. But a few thousand armed soldiers quickly deployed to Rwanda in April, 1994, would likely have saved many, many lives, whereas militarily stopping the suffering of Chechnyans or Tibetans would very likely bring exorbitant costs in death and destruction. In other cases the benefits of an armed intervention includes rescues of suffering peoples, a cost might be significant eroding of the stability and order of a system of states on the planet. The idea is that vigilante justice by state militaries has costs to the international system’s order, stability, and peace, costs that are not balanced adequately by the reduced suffering of people in a particular nation or region. Michael Walzer, like other just war theorists, concludes that the proportionality requirement “… is a gross truth, and while it will do some work in [some] cases …, it isn’t going to make for useful discriminations in the greater number of cases” (Arguing 90). Contributing to the challenges for the proportionality requirements are controversies about its structure: for example, whether an adequate macro-proportionality requires minimizing the bad effects, maximizing the net benefits, or minimizing the balance of benefits over bad effects. Applied to justifying armed interventions, then, the macro-proportionality requirement speaks to a central concern, but cannot reliably discriminate finely among many humanitarian emergencies that arise.

b. Justifying Conduct in War (jus in bellum) and Justice after War (jus post bellum)

The general idea of proportionality is one that links the traditional division of just war theory into jus ad bellum and jus in bello principles. The latter just war requirements govern how a war is to be conducted: proportional means are to be used, and non-combatants are to be distinguished from combatants in waging war. Given the just war theory framework for justifying humanitarian interventions, these in bello considerations are relevant and applicable to uses of military force to address humanitarian emergencies. If an armed intervention is be a (fully) just war, then, the rules of engagement (ROEs) need to reflect both in bello principles. These principles raise many issues for just war theory and some challenging ones for the morality of interventions.

The in bello micro-proportionality requirement governs military operations during a war. The general idea is to minimize the armed force used, and destruction caused, in order to attain a militarily necessary objective. But unlike the ad bellum the macro-proportionality requirement, in assessing the effects of a military operation, it matters much who benefits or suffers. First, combatant and non-combatants are to be distinguished. This is the in bello principle of discrimination. As Michael Walzer expresses it, the general idea is that wars are waged between combatants: non-combatants “are not currently engaged in the business of war” and thereby are “outside the permissible range of warfare” and carry an “immunity from attack” very much unlike combatants. Though being more specific about the distinguishing criteria or about the permissibility of some non-combatant casualties (that is, as “collateral damage”) is controversial and complicated (See much of Walzer’s Just and Unjust Wars, for example), in estimating the consequences of a military operation in war, one is to count much more any ill effects on non-combatants: who suffers matters much. Second, in war and interventions it is permissible to count more the costs to one’s own forces than losses to opposing combatants. The notion of “force protection” becomes morally acceptable, at least within some limits: the conduct of the war is justifiable even if operations distribute risks more to opponents’ forces than to one’s own forces, provided there are “no more casualties than necessary inflicted on the other side.” But third, those force protection limits for intervening forces can become problematic. As illustrated by the Kosovo intervention of the 1990s, high altitude bombing effectively reduces the interveners’ losses while also increasing the costs to non-combatants on the ground. How much “collateral damage” to non-combatants (and non-military property) is morally permissible in order to reduce risks to one’s own forces? How much death and damage to opponents’ military force is not excessive and is morally permissible in order to achieve humanitarian ends?

The traditional in bello requirements of just war theory leads to challenges for this approach to the morality of humanitarian interventions. George Lucas, for example, argues that “the use of military force in humanitarian cases is far closer to the use of force in domestic law enforcement” than it is to waging war. Interveners are there to protect and defend, akin to the mission of a police force. Seeing this more constabulary role of intervening forces entails that “international military ‘police-like’ forces (like actual police forces) must incur considerable additional risk, even from suspected guilty parties,” while, like domestic police forces, “refrain from excessive collateral damage, … the deliberate targeting of non-combatants, … [and] engaging in violation of the law.” These are “far more stringent restrictions in certain respects than traditional jus in bello” requirements. Indeed, these stringent restrictions apply even if interventions are seen as “saving strangers” and the mission seen as a rescue. Thus, Lucas concludes, “the attempt to assimilate or subsume humanitarian uses of military force under traditional just war criteria fails.” Interventions “are sufficiently unique as to demand their own form of justification, … jus in pace, or jus in intervention,” and specific, substantive requirements for interventions are proposed in a structure parallel to the traditional just war framework of jus ad bellum and jus in bello principles.

A third major facet of just war theory, jus post bellum – literally “after war” – is also sometimes a framework for examining the morality of humanitarian interventions. The 18^th century work of Immanuel Kant, in Perpetual Peace and elsewhere, is often credited with originating the notion of jus post bellum, though Vitoria and Suarez both earlier distinguish this facet of just war theory. The roots of the notion are embedded in the classic “right intention” requirement that the aim of justifiable war is to be peace. How one ends a war – even a just one – affects whether peace will follow, for how long, and the structure of the peace that will or should be. For example, is a just end of war establishment of the status quo ante bellum, which is perhaps plausible for wars of self-defense against an invasion? Or ought a war end by establishing “peace with justice?” And what might such justice require – unconditional surrender, reparations, repatriations, disarmament, punishment of perpetrators, structural adjustments in the distributions of land or wealth, establishment of democracy, restorations of relationships? In international law and among just war theorists, this third major component of just war theory has received comparatively little attention. (One important exception is the work of Brian Orend.) Jus post bellum issues are important to the morality of humanitarian interventions. As C.A.J. Coady cautions, considering interventions requires specifying not only from what it is people are to be rescued, but also for what it is that they are rescued (in Chatterjee & Scheid, 291).

Jus post bellum considerations lead to tensions and challenges for thinking about the purposes and morality of humanitarian interventions. For example, given the nature of supreme humanitarian emergencies, stopping the violence leaves a great need for extremely difficult reconciliation processes, a facet of rebuilding a functioning social order. In addition, to prevent recurring violence the root causes may need to be identified and addressed, which likely involves major changes in a society’s basic structure and institutions. Perhaps justice requires some punitive action towards perpetrators and accomplices, whether heads of state, government officials, or local militia leaders and private citizens. Arrests, war crimes trials, truth commissions, and the like may be warranted for what is sometimes called “transitional justice.” A concern is that seeking retributive justice can counter needs for reconciliation and matters of restorative justice, as can redistributions of wealth, land or political power to address root causes of the violence (Govier, Orend). The ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect, identifies such issues as elements of “the responsibility to rebuild.” A long-term aim of genuine peace, then, generates complex questions of how such peace relates to other important aims, such as justice.

These kinds of post bellum considerations effectively broaden and perhaps challenge just war thinking about the morality of humanitarian interventions. For example, if the ad bellum success requirement is more than rescuing, defending, or protecting victims, but also includes justice (retributive, distributive, restorative) or rebuilding, then the challenges of success are much greater, the likelihood of success is much less, the capabilities for success (including political will) are rarely available. It would follow that virtually no interventions are justifiable by just war standards: more often many more people will be beyond rescue than what follows from narrower understandings of what a successful intervention entails. Second, these broadening, post bellum considerations challenge the very conception of interventions as rescues, as “saving strangers.” It makes interventions perhaps more akin to a police action, with attention to arrest and enforcement, or more like a mission to establish peace with justice, or more like a complex, long-term humanitarian aid program of which one significant dimension is the use of armed force. On the other hand, one can look at the responsibility to rebuild or seek justice post bellum as a distinct phase following the humanitarian intervention proper. A fully just use of military force – even seen as rescue, protection, or defense – may require that some organization or states address post bellum issues and rebuilding once the violence is ended, but those needs need not be addressed by the interveners themselves. Just war thinking then requires that interveners use military force with consideration of post bellum requirements, but the post-intervention missions need not be the action of the rescuer themselves. Some such distribution of responsibilities may be, for example, what is envisioned by the ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect.

c. Some Implications of Justifying Humanitarian Intervention

Just war theory, in its entirety, articulates appropriately high standards for morally judging war and for justifying humanitarian interventions. Even the ad bellum standards more frequently addressed are not all easily satisfied (a point sometimes insufficiently appreciated due to the excessive focus on threshold conditions, or “just cause”). There are some significant implications of the just war framework for assessing the moral justifications for humanitarian interventions. There are, for example, daunting epistemic issues in establishing that threshold conditions are satisfied or in assessing the complex consequences of an intervention. The latter is only aggravated by the near certainty of unintended consequences for military campaigns and by the frequent situation of estimating effects of using armed force in foreign lands and cultures. As already noted, given the inequalities of military capability among states that affect interveners’ likelihood of success, just war thinking leaves some nations much more vulnerable to interventions for mistreating their own people, while other states can violate human rights with impunity from others’ use of military force to stop the violence. The same inequalities of capability result in an unequal distribution of the right or responsibility to intervene militarily on humanitarian grounds, with all the attendant costs of such interventions.

There is a basic deontic category issue in exploring the moral merits of humanitarian interventions via just war theory. Is a justified war a matter of a right, responsibility, or duty? And what kind of right or duty is signaled by establishing that a war is justified? Parallel questions then apply to justified humanitarian interventions: are they a matter of a right to use armed force, or a responsibility or duty of some kind? What kind of right or duty, then? Addressing such questions from a just war framework intersects with varying conceptions or analogies employed in discussing interventions. For example, one might consider interventions in defense of others as a right associated with rights of self-defense. Associated with individuals’ right of self-defense is a right to use deadly force in defense of others. In parallel fashion, then, associated with states’ right to wage wars of self-defense would be a right to use military force in defense of others. Such a right of defense – of self or of others – is one that the right-holder chooses whether to exercise or not: just as there is no duty to fight in self-defense, then, there is no duty to use deadly force in defense of others. Humanitarian interventions, then, are a matter of moral right, not duty or obligation; and they are what are called liberty-rights or discretionary rights of intervention. In as much as jus ad bellum principles identify when there is such a right to wage war, then they can be used to identify when there is a moral right to intervene militarily for humanitarian purposes.

In contrast, armed interventions are often portrayed in ways suggesting there is a duty to use military force to address humanitarian emergencies. A common conception is the notion of interventions as rescuing others. The “rescue” metaphor suggests using military force is an imperfect duty of individual beneficence or charity, of rendering aid to strangers facing life-threatening situations, or what are sometimes called “Good Samaritan” duties. Such imperfect duties are not correlated with others having a right to be rescued, and wide discretion is accorded the obligated as to when, where, and how to discharge the duty. As we have seen, though, the “Good Samaritan” analogy may be a strained one, at best: states or international organizations’ interventions are not relevantly or sufficiently akin to that of “saving strangers” as if a tragic accident had befallen them. It has also been suggested that interveners are more akin to a police force, which suggests that justified interventions are discharging a duty to protect and defend others in grave danger. A humanitarian intervention, it would seem, is justified under conditions analogous to those for domestically dispatching S.W.A.T. teams. A challenge for either of these conceptions of interventions – as rescue or as constabulary – is a dissonance between a moral duty to use military force for humanitarian purposes and the kind of moral justification for waging war the jus ad bellum principles provide. Does just war theory establish a moral duty to wage war? If not, how can jus ad bellum principles ever support a duty to intervene militarily? To speak of a moral duty to wage war is today not obviously plausible. The notion of a duty to wage war may be consistent with some classic contributors to the just war tradition, such as Aquinas. Late 20^th century theorists, like Michael Walzer, argue that sometimes there is a duty literally to combat evil. But the idea that just war theory establishes duties to wage some wars is controversial and defended by some for only quite unusual circumstances, of which, of course, a supreme humanitarian emergency may be one. As some have argued, jus bellum can establish at most the moral permissibility or right of intervening; additional considerations are needed to establish humanitarian interventions as morally obligatory.

Other proponents of humanitarian interventions argue for a duty to intervene based on taking human rights seriously, as a duty correlated with people’s basic human rights not to be tortured or killed arbitrarily. The general idea is that, as moral claim-rights held by all, human rights entail everyone has a duty to protect and promote the human rights of everyone else (See IEP article, “Human Rights,” sec 3). One form of the argument is that, as a matter of international law, practice, and practicality, these correlative obligations fall largely upon national governments and international organizations (for example, the United Nations). Others argue more forcefully that the logic of basic human rights establishes correlative duties to respect, protect, and defend. In Basic Rights (Princeton, 1980), Henry Shue famously argues that a basic right such as the right not be killed arbitrarily entails not only duties not to kill, but duties to protect or enforce the right: a negative right such as the right not to be killed arbitrarily requires positive action by others (as do positive rights to subsistence). Furthermore, Shue argues later, if and when the primary holder of the correlative duties (that is, the state) fails to meet its obligations, then the duty to protect and defend human rights defaults to others. Thus, humanitarian interventions are justifiable as discharging a (default) duty to protect and defend basic human rights not being respected by the target state. At least in its conclusion, the ICISS Report, The Responsibility to Protect, advances a similar view about interventions. Another, related argument to support a duty to intervene derives from theories of global distributive justice. For example, Allen Buchanan argues that a natural duty of justice obligates all to do what we can “to help create structures that provide all persons with access to just institutions, … where this means primarily institutions that protect human rights” (Justice, 85ff.). Arguments appealing to rights and correlativity relations are not uncontroversial. For those who distinguish positive and negative rights, for example, the correlative duty for a right to life is simply and only not to kill. Thus, so long as a state or international organization is not the perpetrator of atrocities against its own people, it would seem that correlative obligations have been satisfied without coming close to establishing military intervention as a duty. An issue in the background is what one takes to be the model for understanding human rights and the extent to which duties of respect and protection correlate with those rights and for whom or what.

4. Other Issues and Challenges

Just war theory has been the most prominent framework for philosophic discussion of the morality of humanitarian interventions. Other relevant approaches include attention to international law and its ethical implications and an issue central to political philosophy, the concept of state sovereignty. Among the most powerful and prominent objections to interventions are those based on state sovereignty and on what is called “the selectivity problem.” Some alternative frameworks for considering humanitarian interventions are actually challenges to just war theory itself. Political realisms deny the applicability of moral norms to state behavior, including uses of military force. Pacifism typically denies the premise of just war theory, namely, that some wars are morally justifiable, even if waged for humanitarian purposes.

a. International Law and Ethics

Much discussion of humanitarian interventions involves legal issues under the Charter of the United Nations, the central and paramount text of the international law of force. Philosophers of law have accorded relatively little attention to international law. Questions about the legality of interventions, however, exhibit significant philosophic and ethical dimensions, even setting aside here many matters of analytic jurisprudence and whether international law constitutes a genuine legal system, whether there is such a thing as international law at all (See IEP article, “Philosophy of Law”). Attending to the international law of force and human rights involves issues of interpretation, sources of law, ethics of acting illegally and reform, as well as the extent to which states or people ought to be at the center of the system.

At the center of the international law about interventions are explicit provisions of the United Nations Charter and human rights treaties. Proclaiming “the sovereign equality of all states,” the Charter permits states to use armed force only in self-defense, prohibits states’ “threat or use of force against the territorial integrity or political independence of any state,” prohibits intervening “in matters which are essentially within the domestic jurisdiction of any state,” and allows the Security Council to authorize uses of armed force only if domestic strife or brutalities also constitute “threats to international peace and security” (Articles 2.1, 51, 2.4, 2.7, and 39, respectively). The text seems unequivocally clear: unauthorized humanitarian interventions are illegal. And since humanitarian emergencies typically do not threaten international peace and security, the text permits authorizing few, if any, interventions. Furthermore, the nine core human rights treaties and the 1948 Universal Declaration of Human Rights explicitly require only that each state respect, protect, and enforce the provisions listed, such as rights to life. The 1948 Genocide Convention requires that signatories “prevent and punish” the “crime of genocide,” but the only explicitly permissible means is via “the competent organs of the United Nations.” The 1998 International Criminal Court statute (called the “Rome statute”) makes its authority largely dependent upon and only complementary to individual states’ enforcements. Human rights, for example, may be transnational norms, but international law makes the respect, defense, and protection of those rights almost exclusively a domestic matter for each state. So, to promote international peace and security, inter-state uses of armed force are severely limited by law, even when domestic violence against people may be widespread and systematic.

There are ethical dimensions to the system of international law as it relates to interventions. The United Nations Charter has been accepted by consent of all and each members of the United Nations – virtually every state on the planet. State consent is among the established procedures for creating international law and consent creates compliance obligations for states. Legal positivists hold that there are (ethical) obligations to obey laws enacted according to established procedures (See IEP article, “Legal Positivism”). So, for positivists, it follows that states and international organizations ought to obey the law and therefore ought not conduct unauthorized humanitarian interventions. Though each state ought to respect, protect, and enforce human rights, relevant international law texts do not provide a legal basis for unauthorized or for authorizing interventions, even as a way to stop a state’s violating its own treaty obligations by mistreating its own people. Legal positivists maintain that there are legal and moral obligations not to interfere militarily with the domestic affairs of states, even in the face of a humanitarian emergency.

Challenges to this line of reasoning take several forms. First, some legal scholars quite carefully parse the specific Charter texts in ways consistent with humanitarian interventions being permitted. For example, Article 2(4) does not prohibit all uses of military force, but only those aimed at the independence or territory of another state. Legally permissible, then, would be any humanitarian interventions having neither those aims nor those effects. Disagreements about interpretation raise philosophic issues about how best or properly to interpret legal texts. Some dispute such textual parsing as ignoring the original intent of the language. Others deny that original intent is probative, granting a more significant role for contemporary attitudes, beliefs, and norms about interventions, or appealing to a political morality implicit in legal texts and their interpretive history. A second area of disagreement about legalities attends to considerations of non-textual sources of law, or what is called “customary international law.” Analogous to common law in domestic legal systems, general state practice accepted as law is evidence of a rule of customary international law (Article 38(I), Statute of the International Court of Justice). Some argue that long-standing state practice has established a customary right of humanitarian intervention; others deny this claim of fact about state practice, or assert that the written law of the Charter supersedes any putative customary rule. In effect, there is much controversy about what H. L. A. Hart famously has called “a rule of recognition” for the system of international law, especially customary law. One final issue deals with the ethics of acting illegally. At the heart of creating customary law about interventions is establishing a state practice of intervening. This requires that states begin creating a custom by acting in ways neither required nor permitted by international law at the time: legality is created over time only by a process initially requiring illegal actions. Given sufficient moral grounds for reforms to permit humanitarian interventions, then, a moral argument can be made for illegally intervening now to address emergencies and thereby contribute to reforming international law. Unauthorized humanitarian interventions then can be seen as a kind of international civil disobedience by states or international organizations.

b. State Sovereignty and Intervention

State sovereignty is a major issue for humanitarian interventions, whether as source of opposition or of significant challenge for proponents. For centuries the general idea has been that a sovereign state has supreme authority over its territory, its people, and its relation with other states; and so, other states or organizations are not to interfere with exercises of that supreme authority. Matters of sovereignty have been central to political philosophy, international relations, international law, and the institutions and practices constitutive of the modern world order. Prima facie humanitarian interventions challenge state sovereignty and the international system of non-interference in states’ domestic authority. The literature is vast, the issues complex, the notion of sovereignty contentious and controversial to the core.

The 16^th century French thinker, Jean Bodin, in his Six Books of the Commonwealth (1576), is credited with coining the term ‘sovereignty’ to denote a state’s supremacy of authority within a territory and population. Subsequent political philosophers, like Locke, Hobbes, Rousseau, and the utilitarians, have focused much on the source, locus, and limits of sovereignty within a state, while merely acknowledging an accompanying externally directed authority to make war, peace, alliances, and treaties with other powers. The idea of sovereignty as independence from others’ interference is tied originally to the 1648 Treaty (or Peace) of Westphalia and develops into a strong principle of non-interference during the 19^th century. Simply stated, then, state sovereignty involves supremacy and independence of authority with respect to internal matters and with respect to relationships with other powers, including the absence of non-consensual interference by other sovereign states or other organizations. The “Westphalian system” is an order of mutually independent states excluded from interfering in one another’s domestic affairs.

Whether authority is seen as effective control or as a right, the merits of sovereignty as independence are mixed. For example, state sovereignty can express and protect a people’s collective right of self-determination in matters political, social, and cultural. A plurality of independent sovereign states accords appropriate diversities among peoples of the earth; a system of non-interference promotes an international stability and order. The sovereignty of states is sometimes portrayed as akin to that of individual persons, coupling autonomy rights over their own life, independence from external control, and mutual, reciprocal duties not to interfere with others. Also, state sovereignty is long embedded in international law. As mentioned above, the United Nations Charter, for example, asserts the equality, independence, and freedom from external interventions in states’ domestic affairs. In contrast, it is argued, taken too far, sovereignty precludes any international law at all, since supremacy and independence is reduced by any transnational legal rules limiting war or breach of treaties, for example. Similar reasoning leads to concerns that sovereignty precludes appeals to transnational moral norms, such as, for example, natural law duties or universal human rights. Some argue that state sovereignty is not limited by, but literally constituted by international law: there is no sovereignty outside the legal system that constructs it and, thus, the contours of state authority change as the content of international law changes. For example, current international law prohibiting torture, genocide, or disregard for basic human rights effectively redefines the scope of authority accorded states: such acts are not expressions of sovereignty, but abuses.

An often neglected line of argument shows that states themselves express their sovereignty sometimes in order to limit the scope of their own sovereignty – what S.I. Benn long ago called “auto-limitation.” Robert Keohane makes the same point: “…[S]overeignty is quite consistent with specific restraints. Indeed, a key attribute of sovereignty is the ability to enter into international agreements that constrain a state’s legal freedom of action” (in Holzgrefe, 283-284). On almost any account, state sovereignty includes the right to enter into treaties, just as personal autonomy rights can be expressed by making promises or signing contracts that obligate, bind, and limit future actions. If states have freely chosen to sign human rights treaties, for example, or the Genocide Convention, or the United Nations Charter, then, through that expression of their sovereign authority, they have limited what is within their authority later, for example, committing genocide, waging aggressive war, disregarding the outcomes of established procedures or processes. Then states involved in humanitarian emergencies are abusing, not exercising the sovereign authority they chose to limit. Though more controversial and problematic, such “auto-limitation” may also apply to outcomes of procedures yet to be implemented. So, for example, since provisions of the Charter allow for humanitarian interventions by Security Council authorization, any member state’s sovereignty is not violated by duly authorized outsiders using armed force to rescue, defend, or protect that state’s people from abuse.

Discussions of humanitarian intervention have led to alternative ways of thinking about state sovereignty. One line of thinking makes sovereignty of a state conditional and contingent (Holder, 89-96). A state has genuine sovereignty only if it meets minimal moral requirements, such as effective control in maintaining order and security, or avoiding egregious mistreatment of its people, or, less minimally, reflects the political will of the people themselves. So, failed or grossly abusive states, for example, have no sovereignty and, thus, an otherwise justified humanitarian intervention does not violate the target state’s sovereignty. Robert Keohane has proposed that sovereignty rights need to be seen as separable, so that a state, based on certain criteria, retains some kinds of authority while losing others. Sovereignty rights can be “unbundled” and they admit of gradations. So, exclusion of external control over territory may be an authority lost by a state, but that same state may continue to have some limited domestic authority at the same time. Third, is a proposal to see sovereignty as states’ responsibility, a kind of duty to protect all people’s human rights. As described in The Responsibility to Protect, states failing to protect their own citizens’ rights temporarily forfeit sovereignty rights, others’ duties of non-interference are suspended, and then other states or organizations assume the responsibility to protect persons by intervening, perhaps even militarily. That sovereignty includes domestic duties to respect and protect peoples’ rights is a feature of classic social contract theories of state authority, such as by Locke, Kant, or even Hobbes. The proposal, though, controversially maintains that each state’s sovereignty includes a responsibility to protect not only the rights of its citizens, but the rights of aliens in other lands, a responsibility of “saving strangers.” These alternative approaches all depart from the letter of international law about qualifying for state sovereignty. They are an extension of a greater emphasis on human rights as transnational moral norms. Alternative, normative understandings of the modern state show that, under certain conditions, humanitarian interventions are not violations of sovereignty at all.

c. The Problem of Selectivity

Among the most common objections to humanitarian interventions is “the vexed issue of selectivity.” The concern is that states or international organizations choose to intervene militarily in only some humanitarian emergencies: only some sufferings are selected for forceful action by outsiders. Some critics, such as Noam Chomsky (The New Military Humanism, 1999), see selectivity as undermining any and all moral merit to military interventions to protect basic human rights. If humanitarianism is the issue, why intervene here and not there? How does it come about that armed interventions take place in one crisis but not in another? How can it be morally acceptable that, though there are many emergencies warranting others’ forceful response, only some situations are selected for armed interventions and only some people’s basic human rights are defended by others’ military force?

The objection is sometimes seen in terms of ethical consistency: among all those situations where a humanitarian intervention is morally justifiable, in only some of those cases is an intervention conducted. It would appear that like cases are not being treated alike. The implicit appeal is to the universalizability of genuine moral judgments. But a lack of clarity or precision often cloaks the objection. Sufficient sufferings by people – threshold conditions – are only one feature of similarity between cases, and appeals to similarities of sufferings do not alone make the compared cases morally justified. There are other necessary conditions to justifying an intervention (for example, likelihood of success) and sometimes those are not met in the cases being compared. The selectivity problem arises only when one or more situations satisfy all the requirements for justifying uses of armed force. Second, interventions being morally justified is not inconsistent with only some interventions taking place. If being morally justified means there is a right to intervene, then, as with most rights, the right-holder can choose whether to exercise the right or not, whether to actually intervene or not. If being morally justified means there is an imperfect duty to rescue, then, as an imperfect duty, the obligated parties can choose when and where to discharge the duty. Third, understood as ethical inconsistency, selectivity seems hardly sufficient reason to reject all humanitarian interventions as unjustified. The moral flaw of inconsistency does not require doing nothing: because one cannot or does not do everything morally justified on similar grounds, it does not follow one ought not ever do what is morally right.

A second version of the objection points to the substantive criteria by which interventions are selectively conducted, and there is something right about this form of the objection. It is problematic if, among an array of justifiable interventions, states select only some situations for intervening based on morally suspect criteria, such as regional bias or media attention (what is called “the CNN effect”). For example, in the 1990s military force was employed in the Balkans for humanitarian purposes, but not in Rwanda. Assuming both situations warranted intervention, the issue, then, is not only ethical inconsistency, but suspicions about the ethical acceptability of the substantive criteria for selective action. So, for example, if there is moral right to intervene, is it not morally problematic if the right-holder chooses whether to intervene based on the race or region of those people suffering? If there is even an imperfect duty to intervene, is it not morally problematic to select those to be rescued based on whether they are European or Christian, or based on the extent and kind of media coverage provided? This version of the selectivity problem has merit in calling for diligence, discipline, and care in choosing how to exercise rights or discharge duties. It is not clear this version of the selectivity problem is sufficient reason to oppose all humanitarian interventions, unless the reliance on morally suspect criteria is pervasive or even unavoidable. And that leads to a third and the strongest version of the selectivity problem for humanitarian interventions.

The claim is that states selectively intervene based on national self-interest, not based on humanitarian need or warrant. Though seldom distinguished by critics of interventions, a weaker version of the objection is that, among morally justified interventions, states choose to intervene in those situations that serve their national interest. A kind of national prudence supervenes on the array of morally permissible interventions. It is not obvious that this is problematic for states any more than it is for individuals who invoke principles of prudence to choose among morally permissible possibilities. And it does not seem sufficient to reject humanitarian interventions as unjustified, even if, in fact, all states do combine moral and prudential consideration in selecting sites for intervention. A stronger version of the objection, however, reflects concerns about imperialistic ambitions or hegemonies of intervening parties. One can see this objection as a skepticism about what genuinely drives states’ decision about whether to intervene or not. The selectivity objection, then, is not so much concerned about moral flaws or inconsistency, but relies on the inescapable role of national self interest in deciding whether to intervene. Seen this way, the objection reflects political realism as an alternative framework for considering the international arena, including states and humanitarian interventions.

d. Political Realism

Political realism takes many forms, none of which support independent ethical norms as relevant to international relations, including states’ uses of armed force or war (See IEP article, “Political Realism”). Strong forms of descriptive realism maintain that all state action is in pursuit of national self-interest, typically understood in terms of national security, military or economic power, or material well-being. If all states’ actions are, in fact, motivated by self-interest, then state actions motivated solely or primarily by humanitarian considerations are not possible or morally justifiable. Such a strong form of descriptive political realism, however, is a dubious empirical generalization about international relations and about the scope and stability of what constitutes national interest. There are examples of states’ cooperating, of states sometimes acting on moral grounds, of states sometimes acting contrary to their national interest, or of states changing what constitutes their national interest (Buchanan and Golove, 873-874). Prescriptive political realism maintains that states should pursue their own national interests in the international arena: it advocates a norm of prudence, of pursuing self-interest, but not of morality, as properly governing state behavior. According to realisms, then, uses of armed force in defense of others’ human rights sometimes occur because it is in the national interest of the interveners. An example might be an intervention conducted in a bordering state, due to the national security interests threatened by having an inept or failed state as neighbor (for example, refugees and interruptions of oil or water supplies). The justifications for intervening, if any, are not moral principles, but appeals to promoting the intervener’s national interests, which is, the realist maintains, the way states do or should act.

Political realists’ amoralism about states’ actions typically correlates with a model of the international arena as analogous to Hobbes’s state of nature (See IEP article, “Social Contract Theory” and “Thomas Hobbes: Moral and Political Philosophy”):

There is no global power, no supreme power to enforce cooperation and peace;
there is relative equality of power among states;
each state should pursue its self-interest, by any feasible means, including by anticipatory domination of other states when possible;
and there is no morality applicable amidst pervasive mutual assurance problems.

In contrast, supporters of just war theory, universal human rights, and morally justified humanitarian interventions typically see the international arena as more analogous to Locke’s state of nature (See IEP article “John Locke: Political Philosophy”). There exist transnational moral norms (for example, of human rights, justice) that bind states and organizations in their relations to one another, including perhaps an international analogue to the Lockean executive right to punish and enforce those transnational norms, even by use of armed force. Though the proposed content of the transnational moral principles may vary, the relevance and applicability of moral principles opposes realists’ amoralism about international relations. Political realisms and defenders of morally justified wars or humanitarian interventions reflect fundamentally different conceptions of world order.

e. Post-Colonialism and Feminism

Post-colonialism’s attention to issues of power, representations in discourse, perspective, and history provides an alternative approach to issues of war and humanitarian interventions. For example, the selectivity issue (IV.C. above) is seen as about abuse of power, and about the discourse of rights, law, and “just war” masking imperialistic ambitions or hegemonies of intervening parties. Examples of abuse abound, it is argued, from the days of the Cold War to later incursions in the Middle East and Afghanistan (Gregory). The moral universalism of human rights and other concepts employed as intervention threshold conditions (II. above) are not neutral, with their emphasis on the individual, on negative civil rights, and on the rule of law. The discourse of just war thinking looks at uses of military force from the perspective of those deciding whether to wage war, not from the perspective of those against whom the war is waged or those who are suffering. Intervening parties, it is argued, are former colonial powers with lingering imperialist ambitions and those to be protected are former subjects of these imperialist ambitions. Given the asymmetries of power in the world, colonialism and imperialism continue in the way in which dominating powers structure and influence the lives of those around the world, so much so that there are nearly insurmountable obstacles for the subaltern speaking and being heard (Spivak). Post colonialist approaches call for skepticism, at least, about moral justifications for war or armed humanitarian interventions; and they call for involving diverse, alternative voices and thinking in response to human suffering.

Feminist thinking about humanitarian interventions includes challenges to the substance and implications of employing the “just war” framework. The questions posed by this approach “risk androcentric or sexist bias” and commonly proposed rules about just interventions “remain gendered in concealed ways” (Cudd, 360, 363). One challenge is to explore the ethics of care as an alternative approach (for example, Held). More direct challenges to the just war framework consider whether threshold conditions, such as genocide or crimes against humanity, incorporate rape and sexual atrocities that victimize women in particular (for example, Card), or whether oppression of women satisfies “just cause” requirements for using military force (Cudd, 369-370). Another concern is that proportionality requirements include among the effects of interventions consequences for enhancing or diminishing “women’s rights and power” and for the relational autonomy of individuals as that concept has been developed in other feminist work in ethics (Cudd, 366). The suggestions often include a call for more attention to non-military, preventive action to address human rights issues, including traditional gender roles and hierarchies.

f. Pacifism

A final consideration is another source of challenge to humanitarian interventions: pacifism. Just war theory’s attempt to delineate some wars as morally justified is between political realism’s denial that morality applies to state behavior and pacifism’s rejection of all war, killing, or violence by states. Among the many varieties of pacifism, relevant to questions about humanitarian interventions is absolute anti-war pacifism, and, in this context, what is often called “just war pacifism.” Using typical just war requirements – jus ad bellum and jus in bello – it is argued that no war has or even can satisfy all jus bellum standards, including, it would follow, wars fought for humanitarian purposes. In effect, just war pacifism opposes all wars by applying rigorously and strictly all the standard requirements for a war to be justified.

Arguments for just war pacifism typically focus on a few jus bellum requirements: proportionality considerations, in bello discrimination as providing immunity for non-combatants, and the idea of war only as a last resort. Calling attention to the undeniable destructive consequences of war and use of military force, just war pacifists deny that the benefits do or can sufficiently outweigh the costs. Proportionality requirements are interpreted and applied in ways that they are not or can never be satisfied, even by uses of military force for humanitarian purposes. The argument depends on complex causal estimations and calculations about which certainty or reliability is dubious. Just war pacifism sees macro-proportionality as capable of much more justificatory work than it is accorded by many just war theorists. The argument is more effectively employed with respect to micro-proportionality and the in bello discrimination principle. Warring parties cannot avoid what is euphemistically called “collateral damage” — the death of non-combatants and and destruction of non-military property – despite the features of contemporary warfare, with its “smart bombs,” drones, and technological targeting controls. Just war pacifism rightly attends to this feature. The pacificists’ argue that even with modern technology, levels of collateral damage remain too high to be morally justifiable. Morally acceptable standards are not and cannot be satisfied; thus, even if all ad bellum standards are met, no war is a just war. The difficulty with the argument is establishing precise levels of morally acceptable death and destruction for non-combatants, whether seen as unintended consequences or not. Of course, if no “collateral damage” is morally permissible, then it would seem that no war, no humanitarian intervention, could be a truly just war. Finally, just war pacifism demands that war be a last resort and argues that always there are or can be non-military alternatives. These arguments typically turn on how to construe the last resort requirement. As mentioned above, a literal reading of the idea excludes most wars or interventions as unjust; and an expansive, counterfactual construal of the requirement makes no wars just, but tends to conflate advocacy for better preventive infrastructure and strategies with justifying responses to developing events. Just war pacifism, like any absolute, unconditional opposition to war and use of military force, must somehow negotiate a troubling moral path whereby innocent persons will not be rescued because of a superior principle prohibiting the use of armed force, even for humanitarian purposes to stop widespread, systematic human suffering.

5. References and Further Reading

Bass, Gary J. Freedom’s Battle: The Origins of Humanitarian Intervention. New York: Random House, 2008.
- An easily readable rendition of modern cases of interventions in order to show that “all of the major themes of today’s heated debates about humanitarian intervention … were voiced throughout the nineteenth century.”
Buchanan, Allen. Justice, Legitimacy, and Self-Determination: Moral Foundations for International Law. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2004.
- A significant contribution to a number of issues and discussions, albeit challenging in its sophistication and conclusions rooted in a Kantian approach to moral theory.
Buchanan, Allen, and David Golove. “Philosophy of International Law,” in The Oxford Handbook of Jurisprudence & Philosophy of Law. Ed. Jules Coleman and Scott Shapiro. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002. 868-934.
- A defense and description of normative philosophy of international law, including attention to political realism, legal positivism, transnational distributive justice, human rights, secession, and humanitarian intervention (but not including just war theory).
Card, Claudia. “The Paradox of Genocidal Rape Aimed at Forced Pregnancy.” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 46 (2008): 176-189.
Chatterjee, Dee K., and Don E. Scheid, eds. Ethics and Foreign Intervention. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
- A collection of contributions to conceptual and normative issue of humanitarian intervention, the merits and limits of the “just war” approach, law and secession, and critiques of interventionism. Especially recommended are the contributions by essays by Hoffmann, Brown, Lucas, and Coady.
Cudd, Ann E. “Truly humanitarian intervention: considering just causes and methods in a feminist cosmopolitan frame.” Journal of Global Ethics 9 (2013): 359-375.
Fletcher, George P., and Jens D. Ohlin. Defending Humanity: When Force is Justified and Why. New York: Oxford University Press, 2008.
Govier, Trudy. “War’s Aftermath: The Challenge of Reconciliation.” War: Essays in Political Philosophy. Ed. Larry May. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008. 229-248.
Gregory, Derek. The Colonial Present: Afghanistan, Palestine, Iraq. Wiley-Blackwell, 2004.
Held, Virginia. “Military Intervention and the Ethics of Care.” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 46 (2008): 1-20.
Hoffman, Stanley. The Ethics and Politics of Humanitarian Intervention. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1997.
Holder, Cindy. “Responding to Humanitarian Crises.” War: Essays in Political Philosophy. Ed. Larry May. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008. 85-104.
Holzgrefe, J. L., and Robert O. Keohane, eds. Humanitarian Intervention: Ethical, Legal, and Political Dilemmas. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
- A collection of contributions, including an excellent survey of philosophic issues in the humanitarian intervention debate by Holzgrefe. Other contributors address issues of international law, global ethics, and state sovereignty.
International Commission on Intervention and State Sovereignty (ICISS). The Responsibility to Protect: Report of the International Commission, and Supplementary Volume to the Report. Ottawa: International Development Research Centre, 2001.
- The Report is a pithy summary of major issues, of a defense of interventions in terms of “just war” principles, and with attention to institutional and legalities related to the UN. The supplementary volume includes experts’ background essays on history and major issues (for example, “State Sovereignty,” “Prevention”), presentations of numerous cases, and extensive bibliographies organized by facets of the debates and controversies about humanitarian interventions.
Johnson, James Turner. Morality and Contemporary Warfare. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1999.
- A historically informed approach to the just war tradition and the theory’s suitability for today’s world. Chapter 3 is devoted to “the question of intervention.”
Jokic, Alexander, ed. Humanitarian Intervention: Moral and Philosophical Issues. Toronto: Broadview Press, 2003.
- A collection of conference papers; especially recommended are contributions by Ellis, Wilkins, Pogge, and Buchanan.
Lang, Anthony F., ed. Just Intervention. Washington, D.C.: Georgetown University Press, 2003.
- Especially relevant are contributions by Nardin, Chesterman, Weiss, and Cook.
Lee, Steven P. Ethics and War: An Introduction. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012.
- A comprehensive, sophisticated introduction to “just war” theory which includes advocating a “human rights paradigm” to address interventions and questions of state sovereignty.
Lucas, Jr., George R. Perspectives on Humanitarian Military Intervention. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2001.
Nardin, Terry, and Melissa S. Williams, eds. Humanitarian Intervention. NOMOS XLVII. New York: New York University Press, 2006.
Orend, Brian. The Morality of War. Second edition. Toronto: Broadview Press, 2013.
- Written by one of the major contributors to contemporary just war theory, including extensive attention to jus post bellum issues.
Orford, Anne. Reading Humanitarian Intervention. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
Rawls, John. The Law of Peoples. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1999.
- This work is prominent in discussions of a host of issues in global ethics and international law. An extension of his landmark social contract argument in A Theory of Justice (1971), in the context of a contractarian theory of international society and law, this work briefly addresses human rights, just wars, and interventions.
Smith, Michael. “Humanitarian Intervention: An Overview of the Ethical Issues.” Ethics and International Affairs 12 (1998): 63-79.
Spivak, Gayatri Chakravorty.“Can the Subaltern Speak?” Marxism and the Interpretation of Culture. Ed. C. Nelson and L. Grossberg. University of Illinoise Press, 1988. 271-313.
Teson, Fernando R. Humanitarian Intervention: An Inquiry into Law and Morality. Third edition. Ardsley, NJ: Transnational Publishers, 2005.
- Written by an international law professor, this volume develops a philosophic and legal defense of interventions from a decidedly liberal, Kantian perspective.
Walzer, Michael. Just and Unjust Wars: A Moral Argument with Historical Examples. Third edition. New York: Basic Books, 1977, 2000.
- Now in a fourth edition, this volume has become the classic, early 21^st century discussion of “Just War” theory in its entirety. Chapter 6 is devoted to interventions and the Preface to the Third Edition succinctly outlines major issues for morally justifying humanitarian interventions.
Walzer, Michael. Arguing about War. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2004.
- A collection of essays addressing developing issues in just war theory, including humanitarian interventions (see especially selection 5, “The Politics of Rescue”).
Wheeler, Nicholas J. Saving Strangers: Humanitarian Intervention in International Society. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
- Discussions of the most prominently discussed cases of the last half century, to explore “how different theories of international society lead to different conceptions of the legitimacy of humanitarian intervention.”

Author Information

Robert Hoag
Email: Bob_Hoag@berea.edu
Berea College
U. S. A.

Epistemic Consequentialism

Consequentialism is the view that, in some sense, rightness is to be understood in terms of conduciveness to goodness. Much of the philosophical discussion concerning consequentialism has focused on moral rightness or obligation or normativity. But there is plausibly also epistemic rightness, epistemic obligation, and epistemic normativity. Epistemic rightness is often denoted with talk of justification, rationality, or by merely indicating what should be believed. For example, my belief that I have hands is justified, while my belief that I will win the lottery is not; Alice’s total belief state is rational, while Lucy’s is not; we all should be at least as confident in p or q as we are in p. The epistemic consequentialist claims, roughly, that these kinds of facts about epistemic rightness depend solely on facts about the goodness of the consequences. In slogan form, such a view holds that the epistemic good is prior to the epistemic right.

Many epistemologists seem to have sympathy for the basic idea behind epistemic consequentialism, because many epistemologists have been attracted to the idea that epistemic norms that describe appropriate belief-forming behavior ultimately earn their keep by providing us with some means to garner what is often thought to be the epistemic good of accurate beliefs. Consequentialist thinking has also gained popularity among more formally minded epistemologists, who apply the tools of decision theory to argue in consequentialist fashion for various epistemic norms. And there is also a consequentialist strand in certain areas of philosophy of science, especially those areas that attempt to explain how it is that science as a whole might have considerable epistemic success even if individual scientists are acting irrationally. Thus, there is a kind of prima facie plausibility to epistemic consequentialism.

Consequentialism
Final Value and Veritism
Consequentialist Theories
Summing Up: Some Useful Distinctions
Objections to Epistemic Consequentialism
References and Further Reading

1. Consequentialism

There is unfortunately no consensus about what precisely makes a theory a consequentialist theory. Sometimes it is said that the consequentialist understand the right in terms of the good. Somewhat more generally, but still imprecisely, we could say that the consequentialist maintains that normative facts about Xs (for example, facts about the rightness of actions) depend solely on facts about the value of the consequences of Xs. In light of this, some see consequentialism as a reductive thesis: it purports to reduce normative facts (for instance, about what one ought to do) to evaluative facts of a certain sort (for instance, about what is good). Smith (2009) and others, however, mark what is distinctive about consequentialism differently. Some maintain that a consequentialist is committed to understanding what is right or obligatory in terms of what will maximize value (Smart and Williams 1973, Pettit 2000, Portmore 2007). Still others maintain that a consequentialist is one who is committed to only agent-neutral, rather than agent-relative prescriptions (where an example of an agent-relative prescription is one that instructs each person S to ensure that S not lie, whereas an agent-neutral prescription instructs each person S to minimize lying) (McNaughton and Rawling 1991). And finally, some maintain that what is distinctive about consequentialism is the lack of intrinsic constraints on action types (Nozick 1974, Nagel 1986, Kagan 1997).

Perhaps the best way to elucidate consequentialism, then, is to point to paradigm cases of consequentialist theories and attempt to generalize from them. On this score there is some agreement: classic hedonic utilitarianism (of the sort defended by Bentham and Mill) is thought to be a clear instance of a consequentialist theory. That theory maintains that an action is morally right if and only if the total sum of pleasure minus pain that results from that action exceeds the total sum of pleasure minus pain of any alternative to that action. The normative facts here are facts about the moral rightness of actions and the utilitarian claims that these facts depend solely on facts about the moral goodness of the consequences of actions, where moral goodness is measured by summing up total pleasure minus total pain.

Though it is not possible to give an uncontroversial set of necessary and sufficient conditions for a theory being a species of consequentialism, it is useful to see that there is some sort of unity to views, such as hedonic utilitarianism, normally classified as consequentialist. The following three-step “recipe” for a consequentialist theory evinces this unity, and will be useful to refer to later. (A similar recipe is given by Berker 2013a,b.)

Step 1. Final Value: identify what has final value, where something has final value iff it is valuable for its own sake (sometimes the term “intrinsic value” is used in the same way).

Example: For the classic hedonic utilitarian, pleasure is the sole thing of final value and pain is the sole thing of final disvalue; thus, final value is here generalizing the concept of moral goodness above.

Step 2. Ranking: explain how certain things relevant to the normative facts you care about are ranked in virtue of their conduciveness to things with final value.

Example: The normative facts of interest to the classic hedonic utilitarian are facts about the rightness and wrongness of actions, so actions are the relevant things to rank. The classic hedonic utilitarian says that actions can be ordered by calculating for each action the sum of the total final value in the consequences of that action.

Step 3. Normative Facts: explain how the normative facts are determined by facts about the rankings.

Example: The classic hedonic utilitarian says that an action a is right if and only if it is ranked at least as high as of any action that is an alternative to a.

2. Final Value and Veritism

Before looking at specific consequentialist epistemic theories, it is worth saying something about what epistemic consequentialists typically think about the first step in the recipe, which concerns final value. Many who are sympathetic to epistemic consequentialism also adhere to veritism (the term is due to Goldman 1999; Pritchard 2010 calls this view epistemic value t-monism). According to veritism, the only thing of final epistemic value is true belief and the only thing of final epistemic disvalue is false belief. Generalizing somewhat so that the view can capture approaches that think of belief as graded, we can say that according to veritism, the only thing of final epistemic value is accuracy and the only thing of final epistemic disvalue is inaccuracy. Not all epistemic consequentialists are veritists; others have thought that there is more to final epistemic value than mere accuracy, such as the informativeness or interestingness of the propositions believed, or whether the propositions believed are mutually explanatory or coherent. Others have thought that things such as wisdom (Whitcomb 2007), understanding (Kvanvig 2003), or a love of truth (Zagzebski 2003) have final epistemic value.

But even those consequentialists who think that accuracy does not exhaust what is epistemically valuable tend to think that accuracy is an important component of final epistemic value (for an alternative view, see Stich 1993). It is not hard to see why such a view is theoretically attractive. Although all explanations must come to an end somewhere, it seems that veritism, or at least something like it, is in a good position to give satisfying explanations of our epistemic norms. Veritism together with consequentialism can do so by showing how conforming to that norm conduces toward the goal of accuracy. If one could show, say, that by respecting one’s evidence one is likely to hold accurate beliefs, then one has a better explanation for an evidence-respecting norm than does the person who says such a norm is simply a brute epistemic fact.

Questions about final epistemic value are important for would-be epistemic consequentialists. This article notes the different views that epistemic consequentialists have held concerning final epistemic value, but there is little substantive discussion about the advantages and disadvantages of competing views about final epistemic value. That said, the debate concerning the nature of final epistemic value is an important debate for epistemic consequentialists to watch. In particular, the epistemic consequentialist will need a notion of final epistemic value according to which final epistemic value is the sort of thing that it makes sense to promote.

3. Consequentialist Theories

In light of the consequentialist recipe above, a specific epistemic consequentialist theory can be obtained by specifying the bearers of final epistemic value, the principle by which options are then ranked in terms of final epistemic value, and the normative facts that this ranking determines. Below, specific epistemic consequentialist theories are presented in this way.

a. A Simple Example

For illustrative purposes, consider a very simple consequentialist theory. According to this view, the only thing of final epistemic value is true belief. Then, say that a belief is justified to the extent that it garners epistemic value for the believer. This can be put in the consequentialist recipe as follows:

Step 1. Final Value: True beliefs have final epistemic value; false beliefs have final epistemic disvalue.

Step 2. Ranking: The normative facts at issue are facts about whether beliefs are justified, so beliefs are the natural thing to rank. According to this view, S’s belief that p is ranked above S’s belief that q iff the belief that p in itself and in its causal consequences garners more epistemic value for S than the belief that q.

Step 3. Normative Facts: The belief that p is justified iff it is ranked above every alternative to believing p.

One might think that this simple view has a relatively obvious flaw. It seems to imply that every true belief is justified and every false belief unjustified. This is what Maitzen (1995) argues:

If one seeks, above all else, to maximize the number of true (and minimize the number of false) beliefs in one’s (presumably large) stock of beliefs, then adding one more true belief surely counts as serving that goal, while adding a false belief surely counts as disserving it. (p. 870)

As clear as this seems, it is actually mistaken. For although the belief that p (when p is false) will not directly add value to S’s belief state, such a false belief may have an effect on other beliefs that S forms later and so, in total, be preferable to adopting the true belief that ~p. That said, no one has defended such a simple version of epistemic consequentialism. In actual practice, the relationship between final epistemic value and epistemic justifiedness is not proposed to be as direct as this simple view would have it. With that, we turn to examine such views.

b. Cognitive Decision Theory

Suppose that we think that rational agents have degrees of belief that can be represented by probability functions, but we think there are still important all-or-nothing epistemic options that these agents have regarding which propositions they accept as true. Patrick Maher (1993), for instance, argues that even if we think of scientists as having degrees of belief, we still need a theory of acceptance if we want to understand science. Why is this? Maher defines accepting that p as sincerely asserting that p (this is not the only definition of acceptance; van Fraassen (1980), though he is writing primarily about subjective probability, thinks of acceptance as a kind of cognitive commitment; Harman (1986, p. 47) sees acceptance as the same as belief and says that one accepts p when (1) one allows oneself to use p as part of one’s starting point for further reasoning and when (2) one takes the issue whether p to be closed in the sense that one is no longer investigating that issue). Further, Maher maintains that the scientific record tells us about which theories scientists asserted not about what credences scientists had. Thus, a theory of acceptance (in the sense of sincere assertion) is needed to understand science on Maher’s view.

If we think of things roughly in this way, then it is natural to turn to decision theory to determine what propositions agents should accept. Decision theory tells an agent which action it would be rational to perform based on a ranking of each action available to the agent in terms of the action’s expected value. To find the expected value of an action for an agent, one considers each set of consequences the agent thinks is possible given the performance of that action, and then sums up the value of those consequences, weighted by the agent’s degrees of belief that those consequences are realized conditional on that action. An action is then taken to be rational iff no other action is ranked higher than it in terms of expected value. When considering which proposition it would be rational for an agent to accept, it is natural to set things up similarly. Instead of evaluating the usual type of actions, one evaluates acts of acceptance of propositions that are available to the agent. These different acts of acceptance can be ranked in terms of the expected final epistemic value of each act of acceptance.

Such an approach to acceptance is briefly discussed by Hempel (1960). Isaac Levi (1967) presents a more complete theory of this kind. Levi imagines that a scientist has a set of mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive hypotheses h₁, h₂,…,h_n and that the scientist’s options for acts of acceptance are to accept one of the h_i or to accept a disjunction of some of them. We suppose that scientists have subjective probability functions, which reflect the evidence that they have gathered with respect to the hypotheses in question. Levi’s basic proposal is that agents should accept some hypothesis (or disjunction of hypotheses) if so-doing maximizes expected final epistemic value where the weight for the expectation is provided by the subjective probability function (this is very similar to, though not identical to, the weighting in terms of degrees of belief mentioned above). What is final epistemic value for Levi (Levi uses the term “epistemic utility”)? According to Levi, final epistemic value has two dimensions that correspond to what the goals of any disinterested researcher ought to be. The first dimension is truth. True answers are valued more than false answers. The second dimension is “relief from agnosticism.” The idea here is that more-informative answers (for example, “X wins”) are valued more than less-informative answers (for example, “X or Y wins”). These values pull in opposite directions. One can easily accept a true proposition if informativeness is ignored as the disjunction “X wins or X does not win” is sure to be true. Similarly, one can easily accept an informative proposition if truth is ignored. Accordingly, Levi defines a family of functions that balance these two dimensions of value. He does not settle on one way of balancing, but instead considers as permissible the whole family functions that balance these two dimensions of value in different ways.

Several features of Levi’s approach are worth noting. First, note that on Levi’s view it can happen that the proposition a scientist should accept is not the one that the scientist sees as most probable, because final epistemic value is a function of both the truth/falsity of the proposition and its informativeness.

The second point worth noting brings us to an important distinction when considering epistemic consequentialism. Levi is interested in the expected final epistemic value of accepting some proposition h₁, but where the value of the consequences of accepting h₁ include only the value of accepting h₁ and not the causal consequences of this acceptance. That is, suppose an agent has the option of accepting h₁ or accepting h₂. Suppose that h₁ is both more likely to be true and more informative than h₂. So on any weighting, and on any final epistemic value function, accepting h₁ will rank higher than h₂ if we ignore the later causal consequences of these acts of acceptance. But suppose that accepting h₂ is known to open up opportunities for garnering much more final epistemic value later (perhaps by allowing one to work on a research project only open to those who accept h₂). Levi’s theory says that the agent should accept h₁, not h₂. Thus, it is a form of consequentialism that ignores the causal consequences of the options being evaluated. What matters are not the causal consequences of accepting h₁, but rather the expected final value of the acceptance of h₁ itself, ignoring its later causal consequences.

One might argue that this feature of Levi’s view is enough to make it thereby not a form of consequentialism, because it is not faithful to the idea that the total set of causal consequences of an option (for example, an action or a belief or an act of acceptance) is relevant to the normative verdict concerning that option. Be that as it may, there is still a teleological structure to Levi’s view: acts of acceptance inherit their normative properties in virtue of conducing to something with final epistemic value. It is just that “conducing” is construed noncausally, in this case as something more akin to instantiation (Berker (2013a,b) explicitly allows such views to count as instances of epistemic consequentialism or epistemic teleology—he uses both terms). For future reference, I will use the term “restricted consequentialism” to refer to views that are teleological in the sense of Levi’s view, but do not take the total set of causal consequences of an option to be relevant to its normative status. In section 5, this distinction is examined more carefully.

Cognitive decision theory fits into our consequentialist recipe as follows:

Step 1. Final Value: Accepting propositions that are true has final epistemic value, and accepting propositions that are informative has final epistemic value. The total final epistemic value of accepting a proposition is a function of both its truth and its informativeness, though the way that these values are balanced can permissibly differ from agent to agent.

Step 2. Ranking: The act of accepting some answer to a question is ranked according to its subjective expected final epistemic value.

Step 3. Normative Facts: One should accept answer a to question Q iff accepting a is ranked at least as high as every other alternative answer to Q.

For criticism of this approach, see Stalnaker (2002) and Percival (2002).

c. Accuracy First

Cognitive decision theory takes for granted that agents have a certain kind of doxastic state, represented by a probability function, and uses this to tell us about the norms for the different kind of doxastic state of acceptance. But suppose that one does not want to take for granted such an initial doxastic state. Does decision theory have anything to offer such an epistemic consequentialist?

James Joyce (1998) shows that the answer to this question is “yes” if we accept certain assumptions about final epistemic value that many find plausible. Joyce argues that degrees of belief—henceforth, credences—that are not probabilities are accuracy-dominated by credences that are probabilities. A credence function, c, is accuracy-dominated by another, c¢, when in all possible worlds, the accuracy of c¢ is at least as great as the accuracy of c, and in at least one world, the accuracy of c¢ is greater than the accuracy of c (for an introduction to possible worlds, see IEP article Modal Metaphysics). Joyce uses this, plus some assumptions about final epistemic value to establish probabilism, the thesis that rational credences are probabilities.

As Pettigrew (2013c) has noted, the basic Joycean framework requires one to do three things. First, one defines a final epistemic value function (often called an “epistemic utility function”). Second, one selects a decision rule from decision theory. Finally, one proves a mathematical theorem of the sort that says only doxastic states with certain features are permissible given the decision rule and final epistemic value function. Let us consider each of these steps in turn.

The final epistemic value functions that are typically used are different in kind than the functions used in cognitive decision theory. Whereas the final epistemic value functions in cognitive decision theory tend to value both accuracy—that is, truth and falsity—and informativeness, the final epistemic value functions in the Joycean tradition value only accuracy (this is why the moniker “accuracy first” is appropriate). Accuracy can be understood in different ways. There are two main issues here: (1) what counts as perfect accuracy? (2) how does one measure how far away a doxastic state is from perfect accuracy? With respect to (1), Joyce (1998) takes a credence function to be perfectly accurate at a world when the credence function matches the truth-values of propositions in that world (that is, assigns 1s to the truths and 0s to the falsehoods). Many have followed him in this, although there are alternatives (for example, one could think that a credence function is perfectly accurate at a world if it matches the chances at that world rather than the truth-values at that world). With respect to (2), things get more complicated. The appropriate mathematical tool to use to calculate the distance a credence function is from perfect accuracy is a scoring rule, that is, a function that specifies an accuracy score for credence x in a proposition relative to two possibilities: the possibility that the proposition is true and the possibility that it is false. There are many constraints that can be placed on scoring rules, but one popular constraint is that the scoring rule be proper. A scoring rule is proper if and only if the expected accuracy score of a credence of x in a proposition q, where the expectation is weighted by probability function P, is maximized at x = P(q). Putting together a notion of perfect accuracy and a notion of distance to perfect accuracy yields a final epistemic value function that is sensitive solely to accuracy. One proper scoring rule that is often used as a measure of accuracy is the Brier score. Let v_w(q) be a function that takes value 1 if proposition q is true at possible world w and that takes value 0 if proposition q is false at possible world w. Thus, v_w(q) merely tells us whether proposition q is true or false at possible world w. In addition, let c(q) be the credence assigned to proposition q, and let be the set of propositions to which our credence function assigns credences. Then the Brier score for that credence function at possible world w is:
This will give us an accuracy score for every credence function for any world we please. Suppose, for example, that we are considering two credence functions defined over only the proposition q and its negation:

c₁(q) = 0.75 c₂(q) = 0.8

c₁(~q) = 0.25 c₂(~q) = 0.3

There are two possible worlds to consider: the world where q is true and the world where it is false. In the world (call it “w1”) where q is true, the Brier score for each credence function is as follows:

As one can verify, c₁ scores better than c₂ in a world where q is true. Now, consider a world where q is false (call this world “w2”):

Again, as one can verify, c₁ scores better than c₂ in a world where q is false.

Once one has a final epistemic value function, such as the Brier score, one must pick a decision rule. Joyce (1998) uses the decision rule that dominated options are impermissible. In the example immediately above, c₁ is dominated by c₂ because c₁ scores better than or equal to c₂ in every possible world. Thus, c₂ is an impermissible credence function to have.

Our example considers only two very simple credence function. The final step in Joyce’s program is to prove a mathematical theorem that generalizes the specific thing we saw above. Joyce (1998) proves that for certain choices of accuracy measures, including the Brier score, every incoherent credence function is dominated by some coherent credence function, where a credence function is coherent iff it is a probability function. (Note that in our example, c₂ is incoherent while c₁ is coherent, thus illustrating an instance of this theorem.) Recall that probabilism is the thesis that rational credence functions are coherent. If we take permissible credence functions to be rational credence functions and if we can prove that no probabilistically coherent function is dominated by some probabilistically incoherent function—something that Joyce (1998) does not prove, but that is proven in Joyce (2009)—then we have a proof of probabilism from some assumptions about final epistemic value and about an appropriate decision rule.

Others have altered or extended this approach in various ways. One alteration of Joyce’s program is to use a different decision rule, for instance, the decision rule according to which permissible options maximize expected final epistemic value. Leitgeb and Pettigrew (2010a,b) use this decision rule to prove that no incoherent credence function maximizes expected utility.

The results can be extended to other norms, too. For instance, conditionalization is a rule about how to update one’s credence function in light of acquiring new information. Suppose that c is an agent’s credence function and c_e is the agent’s credence function after learning e and nothing else. Conditionalization maintains that the following should hold:

For all a, and all e, c(a|e) = c_e(a), so long as c(e) ≠ 0.

In this expression, c(a|e) is the conditional probability of a, given e. Greaves and Wallace (2006) prove that, with suitable choices for accuracy measures, the updating rule conditionalization maximizes expected utility in situations where the agent will get some new information from a partition (a simple case of this is where an agent will either learn p or learn ~p). Leitgeb and Pettigrew (2010a,b) give an alternative proof that conditionalization maximizes expected utility.

Joyce is concerned with proving norms for degrees of belief. The approach can be extended to prove norms where all-or-nothing belief states are taken as primitive. Easwaran and Fitelson (2015) extend the approach in this way. Interestingly, their approach yields the result that some logically inconsistent belief states are permissible (for instance, in lottery cases). The approach has also been extended to comparative confidence rankings (where a comparative confidence ranking represents only certain qualitative facts about how confident an agent is in propositions—for instance, that she is more confident in p than in q). Williams (2012) has extended the approach in a different direction by examining cases where the background logic is nonclassical.

Joyce’s (1998) approach fits nicely into the consequentialist recipe (and subsequent work can be made to fit into the recipe, too):

Step 1. Final Value: Credences have final epistemic value in proportion to how accurate they are.

Step 2. Ranking: Credence functions are put into two classes: dominated credence functions and non-dominated credence functions.

Step 3. Normative Facts: A credence function is permissible to hold if and only if it is non-dominated.

In this way, the accuracy-first approach appears to be an especially “pure” version of epistemic consequentialism. The project is to work out what the epistemic norms are for doxastic states given that you care only about the accuracy of those doxastic states.

However, one prominent objection to the accuracy-first approach questions this. To see this, note that the verdicts about which credence functions dominate (or maximize expected epistemic value) are not sensitive to the total causal consequences of adopting a credence function as they only look at the expected epistemic value of that state and not the causal effects of the adoption of that state. There are really two points here. This first point is the same point that was noted with respect to cognitive decision theory: the accuracy-first program seems to be an instance of restricted consequentialism. This can make the view seem to not genuinely be a consequentialist view. Greaves (2013) raises some objections to the program along these lines; the issue she raises is very similar to the kinds of issues that Berker (2013a,b) and Littlejohn (2012) have raised in objections to epistemic consequentialism in traditional epistemology. The general worry is discussed below in section 5a.

The second point concerns a distinction that can be drawn between evaluating a doxastic state and evaluating the adoption of a doxastic state. The accuracy-first program seems to be interested in the former rather than the latter, which can make it seem further still from traditional consequentialism. This issue can be brought out by an example due to Michael Caie (2013). Suppose we are considering what the permissible credence function is with respect to only the propositions q and ~q where q is a self-referential proposition that says “q is assigned less than 0.5 credence.” This is an odd proposition in that if q is assigned less than 0.5 credence, then it is true (and so it would be more accurate to increase one’s credence in q), but if one increases one’s credence in q to 0.5 or greater, then q is false (and so it would be more accurate to decrease one’s credence in q). In such a situation, an incoherent credence function appears to dominate the coherent ones. To see this, note that there are no worlds where c(q) = 1, c(~q) = 0, and where q is true (because if c(q) =1, then q is false) or where c(q) = 0, c(~q) = 1, and where q is false (because if c(q) = 0, then q is true). The best that a coherent credence function can do is to assign c(q) = c(~q) = 0.5. In that case, q is false, and so the Brier score is 1.5. But compare this with the credence function, c*, according to which c*(q) = 0.5 and c*(~q) = 1. In that case, q is again false, and so c*(~q) gets a better score than does c(~q). Overall, c* gets a Brier score of 1.75.

How can this be, if we have proofs that probabilistically coherent credence functions dominate incoherent credence functions? The answer to this is that the proofs by Joyce and others assume a very strong kind of independence between belief states and possible worlds. Even though there is no world where c(q) = 1, c(~q) = 0, and where q is true, Joyce and others still consider such worlds when working out which credence functions dominate or maximize expected epistemic value. With these possible worlds back in play, the incoherent c* is dominated. In particular, for the desired results (that probabilism is true, that conditionalization is the correct updating rule, and so forth) to go through, we must be able to assess how accurate a doxastic state is in a world where that doxastic state could not be held. Further, we must maintain that facts about the accuracy of doxastic states in worlds where they cannot be held are sometimes relevant to our evaluation of a doxastic state in some other world where it is actually held. This might lead one to question whether this accuracy-first approach really is a form of epistemic consequentialism (though that is of course complicated by the fact that there is no consensus about what it takes to be a consequentialist theory) and indeed whether the evaluative framework can be motivated.

d. Traditional Epistemology: Justification

i. Coherentism

According to coherentism about justification, a belief is justified if and only if it belongs to a coherent system of beliefs (note that the term “coherent” here refers to some informal notion of coherence, perhaps related to, but distinct from, the notion of coherent credences). This on its own does not commit coherentists to any sort of epistemic consequentialism. However, some of the debates and claims made within the coherentist literature suggest that some prominent coherentists are committed to some form of epistemic consequentialism. For instance, in The Structure of Empirical Knowledge, BonJour (1985) defends a version of coherentism about justification. In this work, BonJour devotes an entire chapter to giving an argument for the following thesis:

A system of beliefs which (a) remains coherent (and stable) over the long run and (b) continues to satisfy the Observation Requirement is likely, to a degree which is proportional to the degree of coherence (and stability) and the longness of the run, to correspond closely to independent reality. (p. 171)

BonJour is thus attempting to show that the degree of coherence of a set of beliefs is proportional to the likelihood that those beliefs are true. He calls this a metajustification for his coherence theory of justification. And why is such a metajustification required? He writes:

The basic role of justification is that of a means to truth, a more directly attainable mediating link between our subjective starting point and our objective goal. […] If epistemic justification were not conducive to truth in this way, if finding epistemically justified beliefs did not substantially increase the likelihood of finding true ones, then epistemic justification would be irrelevant to our main cognitive goal and of dubious worth. […] Epistemic justification is therefore in the final analysis only an instrumental value, not an intrinsic one. (pp. 7–8)

This strongly suggests that BonJour thinks of the epistemic right—justification—in consequentialist terms (Berker (2013a) claims that BonJour (1985) should be understood in this way). If justification understood as coherence is not conducive to truth, then justification understood as coherence is not valuable. This suggests the following picture:

Step 1. Final Value: True beliefs have final epistemic value; false beliefs have final epistemic disvalue.

Step 2. Ranking: Sets of beliefs are ranked in terms of their degree of coherence where this degree of coherence is proportional to the likelihood that the set of beliefs is true.

Step 3. Normative Facts: A belief is justified iff it belongs to a set of beliefs that is coherent above some threshold.

The claim in Step 2, that coherence is truth-conducive, has been addressed explicitly in the literature, starting with Klein and Warfield (1994). They argue that the fact that one set of propositions is more coherent than another set does not entail that the conjunction of the propositions in the first set is more likely to be true than the conjunction of propositions in the second set. The basic argument is that a set of propositions (say, the set including a and b) can sometimes be made more coherent by adding an additional proposition to it (to yield the set including a, b, and c). However, the conjunction (a and b and c) is never more probable than the conjunction (a and b). Bovens and Hartmann (2003) and Olsson (2005) add to this literature and each prove results to the effect that no matter one’s measure of coherence, there will be cases where one set is more coherent than another, but its propositions are less likely. (For one response to these arguments, see Huemer (2011); Angere (2007) considers whether these arguments undermine BonJour’s coherentism.)

In light of difficulties establishing that coherence is truth-conducive, it is open to coherence theorists to not go down the consequentialist route. Such a coherentist might maintain that beliefs that are members of coherent sets are epistemically right independent of whether such sets are likely to be true. This mimics the non-consequentialist Kantian who maintains that certain actions are right independent of the final value that taking these actions leads to.

ii. Reliabilism

Reliabilism about justification, as championed by Alvin Goldman (1979), maintains that beliefs are justified when they are produced by suitably reliable processes. Put another way, beliefs are justified when produced by the right kinds of processes, and the right kinds of processes are those that are truth-conducive. One helpful way to think about the consequentialist structure of reliabilism is to think of it as analogous to rule utilitarianism. According to the rule utilitarian, we evaluate moral rules for rightness directly in terms of the consequences of their widespread acceptance. Actions are then evaluated in terms of whether or not they conform to a right rule. Similarly, according to reliabilism, the things up for direct consequentialist evaluation are not acts of acceptance or particular beliefs that could be adopted. Rather, processes of belief formation are evaluated consequentially. Reliabilists tend to see true belief as the sole thing of final epistemic value. Processes are thus evaluated based on their truth-ratios, the ratio of true beliefs produced to total beliefs produced. However, unlike a maximizing theory, reliabilism maintains that a process is acceptable just in case it has a truth-ratio above some absolute threshold. It is thus different from maximizing theories in two ways. First, a process can be acceptable even if it is not the most reliable process and thus not the optimally truth-conducive process. Second, a process need not be acceptable even if it is the most reliable process, because the reliabilist requires that processes meet some minimum threshold to be acceptable.

We can put a simple version of reliabilism about justification into our consequentialist recipe:

Step 1. Final Value: True beliefs have final epistemic value; false beliefs have final epistemic disvalue.

Step 2. Ranking: Processes are put into two classes: acceptable and not acceptable. If the process has a reliability score at or above the threshold, the process is acceptable; otherwise, it is not acceptable. The reliability score of a process p at world w is given by the sum of the true beliefs that process p produces at w divided by the sum of the total beliefs that process p produces at w (that is, the truth-ratio of p at w).

Step 3. Normative Facts: A belief is justified for S at t at w iff S’s belief at t at w is produced by an appropriate belief-forming process at w.

There are subtle ways in which reliabilism can differ from what the recipe above suggests. One of the most notable differences concerns Goldman’s (1986) approach. Although Goldman (1979) gives a theory that looks very much like what is represented above, in Goldman (1986) it is not individual processes that are ranked at Step 2, but rather systems of rules about which processes may and may not be used. A system of rules is then acceptable if and only if a believer who follows those rules has an overall truth-ratio above a certain threshold. Thus, the analogy to rule utilitarianism is even stronger in Goldman (1986) than in Goldman (1979), something which he explicitly notes. There has also been some dispute among reliabilists about the exact way that processes should be scored for their reliability (and so the exact form of Step 2), but despite that, the view looks to be committed to some form of consequentialism.

iii. Evidentialism

One of the main rivals of reliabilism about justification is evidentialism, initially defended by Richard Feldman and Earl Conee (1985) (whether evidentialism is a rival of coherentism depends subtly on exactly how the views are spelled out). Evidentialism maintains that the belief that p is justified for an agent at time t iff p is supported by the agent’s total evidence at t. Conee (1992) motivates the total evidence requirement with reference to an overriding goal of true belief, in which case evidentialists agree with reliabilists and with BonJour-style coherentists that justification is a matter of truth conduciveness. Feldman (2000) motivates the total evidence requirement with reference to an overriding goal of reasonable belief (rather than true belief), in which case evidentialists disagree with reliabilists and BonJour-style consequentialists about the nature of final epistemic value, but agree that justification should be spelled out in consequentialist terms. More recently, Conee and Feldman (2008) have suggested that what has final epistemic value is coherence. Whether this view is committed to consequentialism depends on how the details are spelled out. If the idea is that a doxastic state is justified in proportion to how much it promotes the value of coherence, whether in itself or in its causal consequences, then such a view is plausibly committed to consequentialism, with the good of coherence substituted for the good of true belief. However, there may be other ways of interpreting their view according to which it looks less committed to consequentialism.

It should be noted that Feldman (1998) makes clear that the only thing relevant to whether one should believe p is one’s evidence now concerning p’s truth. The causal consequences of believing p are explicitly ruled out by Feldman as relevant to that belief’s justificatory status. So if Feldman is to count as a consequentialist, it is of a very restricted sort. Presumably, Feldman holds something similar in Conee and Feldman (2008). Conee (1992), on the other hand, has expressed more sympathy with the idea that we should sometimes sacrifice epistemic value now for more epistemic value later. Thus, there is perhaps a stronger case that Conee’s version of evidentialism is also some form of consequentialism.

e. Traditional Epistemology Not Concerned with Justification

Stephen Stich (1990) offers a method of epistemic evaluation not concerned with justification, but that is committed to consequentialism. According to Stich, there are no special epistemic values (such as true belief), there are just things that people happen to value. Reasoning processes and reasoning strategies are seen as one tool that we use to get what we value. Stich (1993, p. 24) writes: “One system of cognitive mechanism is preferable to another if, in using it, we are more likely to achieve those things that we intrinsically value.” Thus, we have cognitive mechanisms being ranked in terms of their consequences, but where the consequences that matter are not uniquely epistemic, but rather anything that we happen to intrinsically value.

Richard Foley’s (1987) The Theory of Epistemic Rationality is not directed at analyzing justification. Nevertheless, it provides another example of work in traditional epistemology that seems to be committed to some form of epistemic consequentialism. Foley identifies our epistemic goal as that of now believing those propositions that are true and not now believing those propositions that are false. It is then epistemically rational for a person to believe a proposition whenever on careful reflection that person has reason to believe that believing that proposition will promote his or her epistemic goals, provided that all else is equal. Foley is clear, however, that he does not intend his view to sanction as rational adopting a belief that one is now confident is false in order to garner more true beliefs later. Thus, like some of the other views canvassed here, Foley adopts something like a consequentialist framework for evaluating beliefs, but in a restricted way, where the causal consequences of beliefs are not relevant to the normative verdicts of those beliefs.

Though a large focus of Goldman (1986) is to give a reliabilist account of justification, he notes that there are other important ways that processes, and thus that beliefs produced by those processes, can be evaluated. In particular, Goldman considers evaluating processes for their speed and for their power. The speed of a process concerns how quickly a process issues true beliefs. The power of a process concerns how much information a process gives to you. A highly reliable process might have very little speed if it takes a very long time to issue a belief. And the same highly reliable process might have very little power if it produces only that one belief. Goldman suggests that we can use a consequentialist-style analysis to evaluate processes in these ways, too.

Bishop and Trout (2005) argue against the practice of so-called standard analytic epistemology, which includes many of the approaches to justification looked at above. Bishop and Trout propose a view according to which we evaluate reasoning strategies by drawing on empirical work in psychology, rather than by consulting our intuitions. According to Bishop and Trout, the three factors that affect the quality of a reasoning strategy are: (1) whether the strategy is reliable across a wide range of problems, (2) the ease with which the strategy is used, and (3) the significance of the problems toward which the reasoning strategy can be used. They emphasize that whether a set of reasoning strategies is an excellent one to use depends on a cost/benefit analysis. It is natural, then, to think of their normative verdicts about whether a reasoning strategy is excellent as depending on the consequences of using that strategy along dimensions (1)–(3).

In this section and in the one before, we have seen that some traditional epistemologists with otherwise diverse views about justification or epistemic evaluation more generally seem to be committed, at bottom, to a kind of epistemic consequentialism. The aforementioned theories do not merely identify some bearer of final epistemic value, but also define one designator of epistemic rightness (for example, justification, rationality, epistemic excellence) in terms of such value.

f. Social Epistemology

Social epistemology is concerned with the way that social institutions, practices, and interactions are related to our epistemic endeavors, such as knowledge generation. Several prominent approaches within social epistemology also seem to be committed to some form of epistemic consequentialism.

Alvin Goldman’s (1999) Knowledge in a Social World is a nice example of social epistemology done with explicit commitments to consequentialism. Goldman writes:

People have interest, both intrinsic and extrinsic, in acquiring knowledge (true belief) and avoiding error. It therefore makes sense to have a discipline that evaluates intellectual practices by their causal contributions to knowledge or error. This is how I conceive of epistemology: as a discipline that evaluates practices along truth-linked (veritistic) dimensions. Social epistemology evaluates specifically social practices along these dimensions. (p. 69)

Goldman’s general approach is to adopt a question-answering model. According to this approach, beliefs in propositions have value or disvalue when those propositions are answers to questions that interest the agent. This suggests that Goldman promotes a view according to which final epistemic value is accuracy with respect to questions of interest, and not mere accuracy alone. As Goldman conceives of it, the epistemic value of believing a true answer to a question of interest is 1, the epistemic value of withholding belief to a true answer is 0.5, and the epistemic value of rejecting a true answer is 0. Goldman extends this to degrees of belief in that natural way: the epistemic value of having a degree of belief x in a true proposition is x. (It is worth noting that this corresponds to a scoring rule that is improper, compare section 3c.) We can then evaluate social practices instrumentally, in terms of their causal contributions to belief states that have final epistemic value. Goldman does this by first specifying the appropriate range of applications for a practice. This will involve actual and possible applications (because some practices do not have an actual track record). Second, one takes the average performance of the practice across these applications. The average performance of a practice determines how it is ranked compared to its competitors. Thus, on this view, it is something like objective expected epistemic value that ranks the various practices.

Consider an example. Goldman argues that civil-law systems are better, from an epistemic perspective, than are common-law systems. The argument for this is complex, but the general structure follows the framework described above. Goldman considers various differences between the two systems, including the numerous exclusionary evidentiary rules in the common-law system as compared to the civil-law system, the large role that adversarial lawyers play in the common-law system as compared to the civil-law system, and the fact that the civil-law system employs trained judges as decision-makers rather than lay jurors. With respect to each of these differences, one can approximate the epistemic value for the relevant decision-makers under each system. For instance, one can estimate how many correct verdicts compared to incorrect verdicts jurors would reach if there were exclusionary evidentiary rules compared to if there were not. On balance, Goldman argues, the civil-law system performs better. For another evaluation of legal structures in consequentialist terms, see Laudan (2006).

Goldman (1999) directs this same style of consequentialist argument toward a variety of social practices, including testimony, argumentation, Internet communication, speech regulation, scientific conventions, law, voting, and education.

Note, however, an important shift in the consequentialist view Goldman defends here compared to earlier theories considered. Previously, the things being evaluated have been belief states or acts of acceptance. Here, Goldman is evaluating social practices and methodologies. We could call the approach in Goldman (1999) an instance of methodological epistemic consequentialism, whereas the former theories are instances of doxastic epistemic consequentialism (note that this terminology is not standard and is introduced simply for clarity within this article).

The basic view can be put into our recipe as follows:

Step 1. Final Value: Accurate beliefs of S in answer to questions that interest S have final epistemic value.

Step 2. Ranking: Social practices are ranked according to the average amount of final epistemic value that they produce across the range of situations they can be applied to.

Step 3. Normative Facts: Social practice A is epistemically better than social practice B just in case A and B are alternatives to each other and A is ranked higher than B in Step 2.

For criticism of Goldman’s social epistemology that focuses specifically on its consequentialist commitments, see DePaul (2004). See also Fallis (2000, 2006).

g. Philosophy of Science

Though Goldman’s work in social epistemology touches on aspects of science, more generally his focus is on social practices. Others are interested in similar questions about social practices, structures, and conventions, but specifically with respect to science. In some of this work, there is a clear foundation of something like epistemic consequentialism.

i. Group versus Individual Rationality

Philip Kitcher (1990) is one of the first to apply formal models to social structures in science to determine the optimal structure for a group of researchers to achieve their scientific goals. The guiding idea behind his work is that if everyone were rational, then they would each make decisions about which projects to explore based on what the evidence supports and there would be a uniformity of practices among scientists. This uniformity would be bad, however, because it would prevent people from pursuing research on new up-and-coming theories (for example, continental drift in the 1920s) as well as on older outgoing theories (for example, phlogiston theory in the 1780s). Kitcher defines two notions: X’s personal epistemic intentions are what X wishes to achieve himself and X’s impersonal epistemic intentions are what X wishes his community to achieve. The question at hand can then be put: how would scientists rationally decide to coordinate their efforts if their decisions were dominated by their impersonal epistemic intentions?

Kitcher formalizes this situation by supposing that there are N researchers working on a particular research question, and each has to determine which research program she will pursue. Define a return function, P_i(n), which represents the chance that program i will be successful given that n researchers are pursuing it. Suppose that each researcher’s personal epistemic intention is to successfully answer the research question. In that case, each researcher will adopt whichever program i has the largest value for P_i(n_i), where n_i is the number of researchers currently pursuing i. However, if we suppose that each researcher’s impersonal epistemic intention is that someone in the community of researchers successfully answers the question, then this way of choosing research programs may not be the way to realize the impersonal epistemic intention. Consider a simple example where there are two research programs, 1 and 2, and N researchers. The best way to achieve the group goal is to maximize P₁(n) + P₂(N–n). But this could be a different distribution than the one that would result were each researcher to be guided by her personal epistemic intention. To see this suppose that there are j researchers in program 1 and k researchers in program 2. It could be that P₁(j+1) > P₂(k+1) and so a new researcher would choose program 1. But for all that, it could be that P₁(j+1) – P₁(j) < P₂(k+1) – P₂(k). That is, the boost in probability of success that program 2 gets from the addition of one more researcher is greater than that of program 1. In that case, it is better for the group for a new researcher to join program 2. Kitcher goes on to argue that certain intuitively unscientific goals such as the goal of fame or popularity could help motivate researchers into a division of labor that helps to reach the impersonal goals rather than the personal goals of each researcher.

Kitcher does not claim that there is one objective answer to what the appropriate epistemic intentions or values are. Nevertheless, there is a consequentialist structure to his argument. Groups of scientists are seen as rational when they choose among options in such a way that they maximize their chance of attaining their epistemic goals. One could question whether this is enough to make the view count as a version of epistemic consequentialism. After all, the options that the agents in Kitcher’s model are choosing between are not beliefs or belief states, but instead decisions about which research program to pursue or about which experiment to run. In this way, Kitcher’s view looks to be an instance of methodological epistemic consequentialism as opposed to doxastic epistemic consequentialism: it is aimed at evaluating actions that are in some way closely related to epistemic ends, rather than at evaluating belief states themselves. Some have argued that approaches such as these do not actually address properly epistemic questions at all. For some thoughts on this, see Christensen (2004, 2007).

Others have followed the general argumentative structure of Kitcher (1990). Zollman (2007, 2010) and Mayo-Wilson, Zollman, and Danks (2011) have focused on the communication networks that might exist between scientists working on the same project. This work reveals some surprising conclusions, in particular, that it might sometimes be epistemically beneficial for the community of scientists to have less than full communication among the members. The basic reason for this is that limiting communication is one way to encourage diversity in research programs, which for Kitcher-like reasons can help the community do better than it otherwise would. Muldoon and Weisberg (2009) and Muldoon (2013) have focused on the kinds of research strategies that individual scientists might have, modeling scientific research as a hill-climbing problem in the computer science literature. They show how it can sometimes be beneficial for the group of scientists to have individuals who are more radical in their exploration strategies.

So far we have surveyed formal models in the philosophy of science literature that seem to take a consequentialist approach to epistemic evaluation. One of the main results of this work is to show how strategies that would be irrational if followed in isolation might yield rational group behavior. Others have emphasized something like this point, but without formal models. Miriam Solomon (1992), for instance, argues for a similar conclusion by drawing on work in psychology and considering the historical data about the shift in geology to accept continental drift. She argues that certain seeming psychological foibles of individual geologists, including cognitive bias and belief preservation, played an important role in the discovery of plate tectonics. Paradoxically, she argues, these attributes that are normally seen as rational failings were in fact conducive to scientific success because they made possible the distribution of research effort. That her work employs a kind of consequentialist picture is evidenced by the fact that she views the central normative question in the philosophy of science to be: “whether or not, and where and where not, our methods are conducive to scientific success…Scientific rationality is thus viewed instrumentally.” (p. 443)

Larry Laudan is another philosopher of science who adopts a generally consequentialist outlook. For Laudan (1984), the things we are ultimately evaluating are methodological rules. Writes Laudan:

… a little reflection makes clear that methodological rules possess what force they have because they are believed to be instruments or means for achieving the aims of science. More generally, both in science and elsewhere, we adopt the procedural and evaluative rules we do because we hold them to be optimal techniques for realizing our cognitive goals or utilities. (1984, p. 26)

There is, on Laudan’s view, not one set of acceptable cognitive goals, although there are ways to rationally challenge the cognitive goals that someone holds. This can be done by either showing that the goals are unrealizable or showing that the goals do not reflect the communal practices that we endorse. On Laudan’s view, then, what has final epistemic value is the realizing of the cognitive goals that we have, so long as these goals are not ruled out in one of the ways above. We can then rank methodological rules, or groups of methodological rules, in virtue of how well they reach those cognitive goals that we have. We then evaluate those rules as rational or not in virtue of this ranking. Laudan does not say that the methodological rules must be optimal, but does suggest, as the quote above notes, that we must think that they are.

ii. Why Gather Evidence?

Another area of philosophy of science that seems committed to epistemic consequentialism concerns the initially odd-sounding question: why should a scientist gather more evidence? On its face, the answer to this question is obvious. But if we idealize scientists as perfectly rational agents, some models of rationality make the question more pressing. For instance, consider an austere version of the Bayesian account of epistemic rationality according to which one is epistemically rational if and only if one’s degrees of belief are probabilistically coherent and one updates one’s beliefs via conditionalization upon receipt of any evidence. An agent can do this perfectly well without ever gathering new evidence. In addition, notice that there is a risk associated with gathering new evidence. Although in the best-case scenario, one acquires information that moves one closer to the truth, it is of course possible that one gets misleading evidence and so is pushed further from the truth. Is there anything that can be said in defense of the intuitive verdict that despite this, it is still rational to gather evidence?

An early answer to this question is provided by I. J. Good (1967). Suppose that you are going to have to make a decision and you can perform an experiment first and then make the decision or you can simply make the decision. Good shows that if you choose by maximizing subjective expected value, if there is no cost of performing the experiment, and if several other constraints are imposed, then the subjective expected value of your choice is always at least as great after performing the experiment as before. Here then we have an argument in favor of a certain sort of epistemic behavior—gathering evidence—that is consequentialist at heart. It says that if you do this sort of thing, you can expect to make better choices. However, it is not clear that this is an epistemic consequentialist argument. At best, it suggests that experimenting is pragmatically rational. To drive this point home, note that it seems there are experiments that are epistemically rational to perform even if there is no reason to expect that any decision we will make depends on the outcome.

Others, however, have attempted to extend the basic Good result to scenarios where only final epistemic value is at issue. Oddie (1997), for instance, shows that if one uses a proper scoring rule to measure accuracy and if one updates via conditionalization, then the expected final epistemic value of learning information from a partition is always at least as great as refusing to learn the information. Myrvold (2012) generalizes this basic result and shows that something similar holds even if we do not require that one updates via conditionalization. Instead, so long as one satisfies Bas van Fraassen’s (1984) reflection principle, then something similar to Oddie’s result holds. For commentary on van Fraassen’s reflection principle, see Maher (1992). For other work on the issue of gathering evidence, see Maher (1990) and Fallis (2007).

Work in this area seems clearly committed to an especially veritistic form of epistemic consequentialism. Here we have an argument in favor of acquiring new evidence (if it is available) that appeals solely to the increase in accuracy one can expect to get from such evidence. As Oddie (1997, p. 537) writes: “The idea that a cognitive state has a value which is completely independent of where the truth lies is just bizarre. Truth is the aim of inquiry.”

4. Summing Up: Some Useful Distinctions

Now that we have surveyed a variety of theories that seem to have some commitment to epistemic consequentialism, it is useful to remind ourselves of two important distinctions relevant to categorizing different species of epistemic consequentialism.

First, some of the theories discussed above are committed to restricted consequentialism. According to these views, the normative facts about Xs are determined by some restricted set of the consequences of the Xs. More precisely, consider a theory that will issue normative verdicts about some belief b. A restricted consequentialist view maintains that something has final epistemic value, but that the normative facts about b are not determined by the amount of final epistemic value contained in the entire set of b’s causal consequences. In the limit, none of the causal consequences of b are relevant; only the final epistemic value contained in b itself is relevant. For instance, Feldman’s view about justification, Foley’s view about rationality, the approach of cognitive decision theory, and some versions of the accuracy-first program appear to be restricted consequentialist views in this limiting sense. Feldman, recall, explicitly states that the causal consequences of adopting a belief are irrelevant to its justificatory status; Foley focuses on the goal of now believing the truth and not now believing falsely, so excludes causal consequences; and Joyce’s accuracy-first program looks at whether some doxastic state dominates another doxastic state when the states are looked at for their accuracy now. Reliabilism is arguably also a form of restricted consequentialism, because the causal consequences of the belief itself are not relevant to its normative status; rather, it is the status of the particular process of belief formation that led to the belief that is relevant to the belief’s normative status. A process of belief formation earns its status, in turn, in terms of the proportion of true beliefs that it directly produces, so not even the total consequences of a belief-forming process are relevant according to the reliabilist.

Unrestricted consequentialist views, on the other hand, are those according to which the normative facts about whatever is being evaluated are determined by the amount of final epistemic value in the entire set of that thing’s causal consequences. It is unclear whether we have seen any wholly unrestricted consequentialist views in this sense, although Goldman’s approach to social epistemology and Kitcher’s approach to the distribution of cognitive labor may come close.

It is something of an open question whether a restricted consequentialism is genuinely a form of consequentialism. Some discussions of consequentialism in ethics suggest that restricted versions of consequentialism are not genuinely instances of consequentialism (see, for instance, Pettit (1988), Portmore (2007), Smith (2009), and Brown (2011)). Klausen (2009) argues that restricted versions of consequentialism are not genuinely instances of consequentialism, specifically with respect to epistemology.

The second important distinction to keep in mind when categorizing species of epistemic consequentialism is a distinction between those theories that seek to evaluate belief states and those that seek to evaluate some sort of action of some epistemic relevance. An example will make this distinction clearer. The accuracy-first program seeks to evaluate belief states based solely on their accuracy. Kitcher’s approach to the distribution of cognitive labor seeks to evaluate the decisions of scientists to engage in certain lines of research based on the ultimate payoff in terms of true belief for the scientific community. As noted above, we could call the first approach an instance of doxastic epistemic consequentialism and the second sort of approach an instance of methodological epistemic consequentialism (again, note that these terms are not established in the literature). With this distinction in hand, we can sort some of the theories above along this dimension. Attempts to explain why it is rational to gather evidence, much of social epistemology, and the work on communication structures and exploration strategies among scientists are instances of methodological epistemic consequentialism. Consequentialist analyses of justification, cognitive decision theory, and the accuracy-first program are instances of doxastic epistemic consequentialism.

5. Objections to Epistemic Consequentialism

Theories committed to some form of epistemic consequentialism will have specific objections that can be lodged against them. Here we will focus on general objections to the fundamental idea behind epistemic consequentialism.

a. Epistemic Trade-Offs

Epistemic consequentialists maintain that, in some way, the right option is one that is conducive to whatever has final epistemic value. Say that you accept a trade-off if you sacrifice something of value for even more of what is valuable. Thus, if true belief has final epistemic value (and if each true belief has equal final epistemic value), you accept a trade-off when you sacrifice a true belief concerning p for two true beliefs about q and r. It is hard to see how one can hold a consequentialist view and not think that it is at least sometimes permissible to accept trade-offs. For then it would seem that rightness is no longer being understood in terms of conduciveness to what has value (though, as we will see, restricted consequentialists of a certain sort may be able to deny this).

The permissibility of accepting trade-offs, however, constitutes a problem for epistemic consequentialism. If one thinks about consequentialist theories in ethics, this is not so surprising. Some of the strongest intuitive objections to consequentialist moral theories are those that focus on trade-offs. Consider, for instance, the organ harvest counterexample to utilitarianism (Thomson 1985). In that scenario, a doctor has five patients all in dire need of a different organ transplant. The doctor also has a healthy patient who is a potential donor for each of the five patients. Because it is a consequentialist moral theory and endorses trade-offs, it seems that utilitarianism says the doctor is required to sacrifice the one to save the five. But, it is alleged, this flies in the face of common sense, and so we have a challenge for utilitarianism.

Trade-off objections to epistemic consequentialism (structurally similar to the organ harvest) have been made explicitly by Firth (1981), Jenkins (2007), Littlejohn (2012), Berker(2013a,b), and Greaves (2013). And one can see hints of such an objection in Fitelson and Easwaran (2012) and Caie (2013).

The basic objection starts with the observation that a belief can be justified or rational or epistemically appropriate (or whatever other term for epistemic rightness one prefers) even if adopting that belief causes some epistemic catastrophe. Similarly, it seems that a belief can be unjustified or irrational or epistemically inappropriate even if adopting that belief results causally in some epistemic reward. For an example of the first sort, S might have significant evidence that he is an excellent judge of character and so S believing this about himself might be justified for S. But it could be that this belief serves to make S overconfident in other areas of his life and so S ends up misreading evidence quite badly in the long run. For an example of the second sort, S might have no evidence that God exists, but believe it anyway to make it more likely that S receives a large grant from a religiously affiliated (and unscrupulous) funding agency. The grant will allow S to believe many more true and interesting propositions than otherwise (the example is due to Fumerton (1995), p. 12). These kinds of examples seem to show that epistemic rightness cannot be understood in terms of conduciveness to what has epistemic final value.

There are two main responses that the epistemic consequentialist can make to the trade-off objection, and each comes with a challenge. The first response is to maintain that, appearances to the contrary, there are versions of epistemic consequentialism that do not sanction unintuitive trade-offs. For a response in this vein, see Ahlstrom-Vij and Dunn (2014). In ethics, some who think of themselves as consequentialists respond to analogous objections by introducing agent-relative values (see, for instance, Sen (1982) and Broome (1995)). The basic idea is that we can have agent-relative values in the outcomes of states, which allows, for example, for agent S to value the state where S breaks no promises more than someone else values that same state. This allows for one to give a consequentialist-based evaluation of rightness that does not always require one to say that it is right for S to break a promise in order to ensure that two others do not break their promises. It is not clear how such a modification of consequentialism would best carry over to epistemic consequentialism, but it could represent a way of making this first response. The challenge for any response in this vein is to explain how such views are genuinely an instance of epistemic consequentialism.

The second response to trade-off objections is to maintain that while epistemic consequentialism does sanction trade-offs, we can explain away the felt unintuitiveness of such verdicts. The challenge for this second response is to actually give such an explanation.

b. Positive Epistemic Duties

When it comes to moral obligation, it seems plausible that we sometimes have obligations to take certain actions and sometimes have obligations to refrain from certain actions. It is then natural to distinguish between positive duties—say, the obligation to take care of my children—and negative duties—say, the obligation to not steal from others. Consider how a similar distinction would be drawn in epistemology. Obligations to believe certain propositions would correspond to positive epistemic duties, while obligations to refrain from believing certain propositions would correspond to negative epistemic duties.

Littlejohn (2012) has argued that certain forms of epistemic consequentialism look as though they will naturally lead to positive epistemic duties. Suppose, as certain doxastic epistemic consequentialists will maintain, that whether we are obligated to believe or refrain from believing a proposition is a function of the final epistemic value of believing or refraining from believing that proposition. And suppose that the consequentialist also maintains that we have some negative epistemic duties; that is, there are situations where one is epistemically obligated to refrain from believing a proposition. The consequences of refraining in such a situation will have some level of epistemic value. But it seems that we can surely find a situation where believing a proposition has consequences with equal epistemic value. Thus, it looks as though the consequentialist is committed to saying that there are positive epistemic duties: sometimes we are obligated to believe propositions.

However, some epistemologists hold that we have no positive epistemic duties. We may be obligated to refrain from believing certain things, but we have no duties to believe. Nelson (2010) provides one argument for this claim. He argues that if we had positive epistemic duties, we would have to believe each proposition that our evidence supported. But this means we would be epistemically obligated to believe infinitely many propositions, as Nelson argues that any bit of evidence supports infinitely many propositions. As we cannot believe infinitely many propositions, Nelson holds that we have no positive epistemic duties.

The thesis that there are no positive epistemic duties is controversial, as is Nelson’s argument for that claim. Nevertheless, this presents a potential worry for certain versions of epistemic consequentialism. It is perhaps worth noting that this sort of objection to epistemic consequentialism is in some ways analogous to objections that maintain that consequentialist views in ethics are overly demanding. For more on the issue of positive epistemic duties, see Stapleford (2013) and the discussion in Littlejohn (2012, ch. 2).

c. Lottery Beliefs

Suppose that you know there is a lottery with 10,000 tickets, each with an equal chance of winning, but where only one ticket will win. Consider the proposition that ticket 1437 will lose. It is incredibly likely that this proposition is true, and the same is true for each of the n propositions that say that ticket n will lose. Nevertheless, a number of epistemologists maintain that one is not justified in believing such lottery propositions (for instance, BonJour (1980), Pollock (1995), Evnine (1999), Nelkin (2000), Adler (2005), Douven (2006), Kvanvig (2009), Nagel (2011), Littlejohn (2012), Smithies (2012), McKinnon (2013), and Locke (2014)).

Some consequentialist approaches to justification, however, look as though they will say that one is justified in believing such lottery propositions. For instance, suppose that there is a process of belief formation that issues beliefs of the form ticket n is a loser. This process is highly reliable and so beliefs produced by it are justified according to one version of reliabilism about justification. Some process reliabilists about justification might maintain that there is no such process in an attempt to avoid this implication of their view. However, as Selim Berker (2013b) has noted, the very structure of consequentialist views in epistemology looks as though there will be some case that can be brought against the consequentialist where some set of beliefs are justified purely in virtue of statistical information about the relative lack of falsehoods in a set of propositions.

Again, not all maintain that there is no justification to be had in such cases; some maintain that while such lottery propositions cannot be known, they nevertheless can be justified. But there are a number of epistemologists who maintain such a view and so we again have a potential worry here for the consequentialist. For a response to this worry, see Ahlstrom-Vij and Dunn (2014).

6. References and Further Reading

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Berker, S. (2013a) ‘Epistemic Teleology and the Separateness of Propositions’ The Philosophical Review 122: 337–393.
Berker, S. (2013b) ‘The Rejection of Epistemic Consequentialism’ Philosophical Issues 23: 363–387.
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Broome, J. (1991) Weighing Goods: Equality, Uncertainty and Time. Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell.
Brown, C. (2011) ‘Consequentialize This’ Ethics 121: 749–771.
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Christensen, D. (2004) Putting Logic in Its Place. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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Author Information

Jeffrey Dunn
Email: jeffreydunn@depauw.edu
DePauw University
U. S. A.

Benedict De Spinoza: Moral Philosophy

Like many European philosophers in the early modern period, Benedict de Spinoza (1632-1677) developed a moral philosophy that fused the insights of ancient theories of virtue with a modern conception of humans, their place in nature, and their relationship to God. Unlike many other authors in this period, however, Spinoza was strongly opposed to anthropocentrism and had no commitment whatsoever to traditional theological views. His unique metaphysics motivated an intriguing moral philosophy. Spinoza was a moral anti-realist, in that he denied that anything is good or bad independently of human desires and beliefs. He also endorsed a version of ethical egoism, according to which everyone ought to seek their own advantage; and, just as it did for Thomas Hobbes, this in turn led him to develop a version of contractarianism. However, Spinoza’s versions of each of these views, and the way in which he reconciles them with one another, are influenced in fascinating ways by his very unorthodox metaphysical picture.

The topics mentioned so far can be related comfortably to twenty-first century debates in moral philosophy. Yet Spinoza was also very interested in another issue that is moral only in the more archaic sense that it pertains to the good life: namely, the means by which humans may (to some extent) achieve mastery over their passions. Though this topic was of central importance to Spinoza, the pride of place he awarded it in his Ethics reflects the fact that seventeenth-century conceptions of moral philosophy were, in subtle but important ways, different than our own.

Guiding Metaphysical Principles
Moral Philosophy in Spinoza’s System
Spinoza’s Remedies for the Passions
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Guiding Metaphysical Principles

The name of Spinoza’s most famous work is the Ethics, but he does not really broach the topic of ethics until part four of the five-part work. The reason for this is that although his aim is to set forth “the right way of living” (E4app, G II/266) and to explain “what freedom of mind, or blessedness, is” (E5pref, G II/277), his accounts of these things depend upon certain key metaphysical principles that he feels must be established first.

This article provides only brief explanations of the relevant principles. For more detailed discussions of each of them, see the main article on Spinoza.

a. Substance Monism

In Cartesian philosophy, a substance is something that does not depend for its existence on anything else—or, in the case of created substances, anything other than God (CSM I, 210). A mode is something that is not a substance (for instance, a property, quality, or attribute). Descartes appears to take the human body and mind to be paradigmatic substances, and the extended properties and thoughts of the body and mind (respectively) to be paradigmatic modes. Spinoza was critical of Descartes for giving a non-univocal definition of the term ‘substance,’ so that the predicate means something different when applied to God than when applied to a human. Spinoza’s alternative approach was to stick to the most general definition: a substance is something that is “in itself and is conceived through itself, that is, that whose concept does not require the concept of another thing, from which it must be formed” (E1d3).

In defining a substance this way, Spinoza avoids the equivocation involved in the Cartesian conception of substances. However, he also quickly concludes that given this definition, humans are not substances. Indeed, Spinoza argues, there can be only one substance, God (E1p14), and everything else is merely a mode of God (E1p15). As a result, Spinoza conceives of God as a being that is absolute and perfect by its very nature; humans, by contrast, are dependent and imperfect by their very nature.

b. Necessitarianism

Although ordinarily we speak as though things could have been different than they in fact are—you could have turned left rather than right, the election might have gone differently, and so on—Spinoza denies that these alternative scenarios are genuinely possible. He provides several different arguments for this conclusion, but perhaps the simplest is based upon the thought that, since the world is a mode of God, and God could not be different than it is, it follows that “Things could have been produced by God in no other way, and in no other order than they have been produced” (E1p33). This divine necessitarianism trickles down: humans, too, could not have acted otherwise than they did. The fact that we ordinarily believe ourselves capable of acting otherwise is an illusion produced by our ignorance of both the physical and psychological forces influencing us, as well as of our own nature (E3p2s).

c. The Conatus Doctrine

Perhaps the most important metaphysical principle involved in Spinoza’s ethical theory is his view that “Each thing, as far as it can by its own power, strives to persevere in its being” (E3p6). The interpretation of this principle is the source of much scholarly disagreement, but a few things are clear. The striving [conatus] at issue is not to be confused with conscious effort, since Spinoza takes the principle to govern bodies as well as minds. Nor is the conatus to be confused with the metabolic processes of a living organism, since Spinoza takes the principle to govern (what we ordinarily consider to be) non-living things as well as living ones. Spinoza is making the metaphysical claim that each thing is possessed of an inner force, by which it continuously reasserts its own existence.

This doctrine is particularly important for understanding Spinoza’s moral theory, since Spinoza accepts psychological egoism on the basis of it: “When this striving is related only to the mind, it is called will; but when it is related to the mind and body together, it is called appetite. This appetite…is the very essence of man, from whose nature there necessarily follow those things that promote his preservation” (E3p9s).

d. Activity and Passivity

In transitioning from his metaphysics to his moral theory, Spinoza relies heavily upon two concepts, activity and passivity, that come to take the place of traditional axiological concepts like good and evil. Something is active insofar as it produces various effects through its striving; conversely, it is passive insofar as it and its states are produced by external causes (E3d1–3). Both activity and passivity are treated as matters of degree. Thus God, the total cause of all things, is active in the highest degree and not at all passive, while humans (since they are not substances) are always partly active and partly passive, causally dependent upon God as well as upon other modes.

With respect to the human mind, activity takes the form of rational or adequate cognition (E3p1). Actions of the mind are adequate ideas, which increase its power of acting, while passions of the mind are inadequate, confused ideas, which decrease its power of acting. Spinoza’s conception of passions is quite general, so, for example, what we would call a “dispassionate” state of melancholy could for him qualify as a powerful passion because of how much it diminishes our activity. This should be borne in mind when we turn, in section 3, to considering Spinoza’s account of how to overcome our passions.

2. Moral Philosophy in Spinoza’s System

a. Spinoza’s Metaethics: Moral Anti-Realism

Spinoza’s metaphysical views quickly commit him to a version of moral anti-realism. A moral realist holds that at least some things are good or bad independently of what we desire or believe to be the case. Spinoza, in numerous passages in the Ethics and earlier works, denies that there are any such moral qualities. His rejection of moral realism is tied up with his rejection of teleological explanations of nature, for he sees the attribution of qualities like goodness or perfection as an error that is based upon the false belief that nature was designed by God with humanity in mind. Spinoza explains, “After men persuaded themselves that everything which happens, happens on their account, they had to judge that what is most important in each thing is what is most useful to them… Hence, they had to form these notions, by which they explained natural things: good, evil, order, confusion, warm, cold, beauty, ugliness” (E1app, G II/82). This family of concepts, which includes moral and aesthetic concepts along with concepts of sensible qualities, Spinoza holds to be produced by the imagination rather than reason. Hence the concepts “by which ordinary people are accustomed to explain Nature…do not indicate the nature of anything, only the constitution of the imagination” (E1app, G II/83).

In addition to providing etiological accounts intended to explain why people make the mistake of treating moral qualities as objective (and thereby to undermine the belief that they are objective), Spinoza develops two distinct arguments for his anti-realism. His first argument for anti-realism is that if moral qualities like evil or imperfection were objective, then it would be conceivable “that Nature sometimes fails or sins, and produces imperfect things” (E4pref, G II/207). But this is inconceivable: such a possibility supposes that there is a goal or standard that nature has fallen short of, yet there is no such goal or standard: “The reason why…God, or Nature, acts and the reason why it exists, are one and the same. As it exists for the sake of no end, it also acts for the sake of no end” (ibid). Again, just as in his earlier discussion, Spinoza’s denial of the objectivity of moral qualities is based upon his rejection of natural teleology. The rejection of natural teleology, in turn, is based upon his substance monism and necessitarianism: “all things follow from the necessity of the divine nature, and hence…whatever seems immoral, dreadful, unjust, and dishonorable, arises from the fact that [we conceive] the things themselves in a way which is disordered, mutilated, and confused” (E4p73s).

It is worth mentioning a second argument that comes shortly after, but appears to have very different motivations: “As far as good and evil are concerned, they also indicate nothing positive in things, considered in themselves… For one and the same thing can, at the same time, be good, and bad, and also indifferent. For example, music is good for one who is melancholy, bad for one who is mourning, and neither good nor bad to one who is deaf” (E4pref, G II/208). If moral qualities were objective, then nothing could have contrary moral qualities at one and the same time. But many things do have contrary moral qualities at one and the same time, with respect to different observers. Therefore, moral qualities are not objective, in the sense that they “indicate nothing positive in things, considered in themselves” (ibid). This argument is quite different than the previous one. The first argument draws out the a priori incoherence that would be involved in the very idea of objective moral qualities, while the second is based upon the empirical premise that different people may judge a thing to have contrary moral qualities. It is an ancestor of the argument from disagreement often used to defend moral relativism.

In spite of the fact that Spinoza rejects moral realism, he does not advocate for the elimination of moral language. To see why, consider an advantage that the moral realist seems to have over Spinoza’s anti-realism. The moral realist, as Spinoza sees it, holds that in cases of moral judgment, we first recognize something to be good (for example), and then this results in our forming a desire for that thing. Though Spinoza rejects this account of moral judgment, one of its benefits is that it allows us to distinguish between what is desired and what is genuinely desirable. Since it often happens that a person wants something and later discovers it really to be undesirable — or even wants something in spite of the fact that he knows it to be undesirable — the distinction is an important one to preserve. For example, we want to be able to make sense of the fact that although someone wants to commit suicide, this is not really desirable; the moral realist’s picture gives us a way to do this by distinguishing the (true) claim that this person desires to commit suicide from the (false) claim that it is good/desirable for this person to commit suicide.

Yet Spinoza thinks the moral realist’s story is exactly backwards: “we neither strive for, nor will, neither want, nor desire anything because we judge it to be good; on the contrary, we judge something to be good because we strive for it, will it, want it, and desire it” (E3p9s; cf. 3p39s). He thus subscribes to a desire-satisfaction theory of value: what is ultimately of value is the satisfaction of desire; things become valuable only by virtue of their being desired, or their serving to satisfy some desire. (For more on this, see Youpa [2010, 209, fn. 1], and Lebuffe [2010, 152–9].) So it may seem that Spinoza will have a problem making the distinction between what we think is good and what is genuinely good for us.

Spinoza agrees that we need this distinction, but holds that our judgments about what is genuinely good for us are based upon an “idea of man” we have formed “as a model of human nature” (E4pref, G II/208). To hold on to the distinction between what a person desires and what is genuinely desirable, then, Spinoza wants to preserve our ordinary talk of good and evil, with the caveat that such talk refers only to the relation between ourselves and an idealized model human (Curley [1979, 356–62], Nadler [2006, 215–9], and Hübner [2014, 136–140]). Hence, Spinoza writes, “I shall understand by good what we know certainly is a means by which we may approach nearer and nearer to the model of human nature we set before ourselves. By evil, what we certainly know prevents us from becoming like that model” (ibid). Since the model is an idealization, the judgment that something is good or evil does not involve any commitment to objective, mind-independent qualities of goodness or evilness. Yet having such a model is useful, since it allows us to make judgments about what will be good or bad for us as distinct from what we presently happen to desire.

b. Spinoza’s Ethics: Ethical Egoism, Contractarianism, and Virtue Theory

The previous section established that Spinoza is a moral anti-realist in the sense that he denies that there exist mind-independent moral properties. Nevertheless, on most readings of the Ethics, Spinoza is also an ethical egoist, since he holds that reason “demands that everyone love himself, seek his own advantage…and absolutely, that everyone should strive to preserve his own being as far as he can” (E4p18s; see also TTP Ch. 16, 175). These two views are compatible, however, since Spinoza’s approach to developing his positive moral theory is to reduce normative claims to considerations of self-interest in a manner reminiscent of Hobbes (Curley 1988, 119–124). Perhaps the major difference between the Spinozist and the Hobbist approaches to egoism is that Spinoza provides a metaphysical argument for the view, in contrast to Hobbes’ psychological argument. Specifically, Spinoza bases his ethical egoism upon his conatus doctrine.

Spinoza’s initial argument for the claim that reason demands that everyone seek his own advantage is brief: “Since reason demands nothing contrary to Nature, it demands that everyone…seek his own advantage… This, indeed, is as necessarily true as that the whole is greater than its part” (E4p18s). Breaking the argument down:

Reason demands nothing contrary to Nature.
It is contrary to Nature for someone not to seek his own advantage.
So, reason demands that everyone seek his own advantage.

Both premises hinge upon what is meant by the claim that something is “contrary to Nature.” By this, Spinoza seems to mean something impossible, something that cannot be, by virtue of incompatibility with either the laws of logic or of nature. In this interpretation, premise (1) is Spinoza’s nod to the commonly held principle that ought implies can: you can be morally bound to do only something that you are able to do. More importantly, given this interpretation, the second premise comes out as a conceptual truth grounded in part of the conatus doctrine.

In E3p4, which he references in his argument for egoism, Spinoza argued, “No thing can be destroyed except through an external cause.” He takes this to entail that “Each thing, as far as it can by its own power, strives to persevere in its being” (E3p6). So, in Spinoza’s view, we have a purely metaphysical argument that it would be “contrary to Nature” for someone not to seek his own advantage. It would be contrary to Nature for anything not to seek its own advantage, insofar as it has the power to do so.

The second premise entails psychological egoism, for it entails that each person will seek his own advantage at all times. Spinoza’s argument for ethical egoism in this sense depends upon psychological egoism, and so it may seem reminiscent of Hobbes’ rationale for the similar conclusion that “of the voluntary acts of every man the object is some good to himself” (L I.xiv; p. 82). However, Hobbes reaches this view on the basis of his account of the psychology of voluntary acts: a voluntary act proceeds from the will, and a person’s will is just the last appetite that strikes him after a process of deliberation (L I.vi; p. 33). Since “whatsoever is the object of any man’s appetite…he for his part calleth good” (L I.vi; p. 28), Hobbes would agree with Spinoza that each person will seek what he considers to be his own advantage at all times. In spite of the similarity of their conclusions, Spinoza’s argument is grounded in the metaphysics of the conatus doctrine, while Hobbes’ argument is grounded in his psychological theory.

One of the philosophical problems with Spinoza’s version of ethical egoism has to do with whether, and to what extent, Spinoza’s view can really be a moral theory at all. Given the argument for the view, it is unclear how Spinoza can take the dictates of reason to be prescriptive. For example, according to Rutherford (2008), Spinoza treats the dictates of reason as adequate ideas that, when we possess them, cause us to act in ways that are conducive to our actual self-interest. If so, to follow the dictates of reason is just to be caused to behave in certain ways, which sits awkwardly alongside the thought that such dictates are prescriptive in any ordinary sense. This topic is the subject of ongoing scholarly inquiry—responses to the problem have been proposed by Kisner (2011, 118) and Steinberg (2014)—and it is closely related to the issue (flagged at the outset of this article) that Spinoza’s conception of ethics is in many ways quite different from our own.

i. The Greatest Good and the Inclination to Morality

For an egoist, the question as to what is good for an individual is crucial, for the answer to this question will determine what that individual ought, morally, to do. And Spinoza’s conception of the good is stereotypically egoistic: “By good I shall understand what we certainly know to be useful to us” (E4d1). Likewise, to be virtuous is simply to have and to exercise the power to do what is in our nature, and (as per the conatus doctrine) what is in your nature is to seek your own advantage as far as you are able (E4d8; 4p20). As a result, strength of character is also accounted for in self-interested terms.

Many passages in the Ethics make it appear that Spinoza simply thinks that what is best for each of us is the continuation of our lives. For example, he writes that “No one can desire to be blessed, to act well and to live well, unless at the same time he desires to be, to act, and to live, that is, to actually exist” (E4p21). Hence, the principle of seeking one’s own advantage and preserving one’s being is “the first and only foundation of virtue” (E4p22c), and obeying this principle is the only pursuit that is good for its own sake (E4p25). If this were so, then we might expect Spinozist morality to license all manner of violations of traditional morality in the name of self-preservation and the advancement of our own interests. Surprisingly, although he takes self-interest and self-preservation as the foundations of morality, Spinoza nevertheless holds that “The good which everyone who seeks virtue wants for himself, he also desires for other men” (E4p37). Although virtue is founded in rational self-interest, rational self-interest in turn urges us to desire the good of others.

To see why Spinoza thinks this, we need to understand this “good” that is desired by “everyone who seeks virtue.” The good in question, which is supposed to trump all other goods, is not actually our own lives, but what those lives are best spent in obtaining—the knowledge of God. Spinoza writes, “Knowledge of God is the mind’s greatest good; its greatest virtue is to know God” (E4p28). The argument for this is characteristically metaphysical, and again based upon the conatus doctrine. Spinoza argues that the “striving of the mind…is nothing but understanding,” and “cannot conceive anything to be good for itself except what leads to understanding” (E4p26d). Our innate desire to understand nature is, in his view, the very essence of our minds, and so this drive to understand also characterizes the good for us. Finally, “The greatest thing the mind can understand is God” (E4p28d), since ‘God’ signifies the whole of nature, so it follows that “the mind’s greatest advantage…is knowledge of God” (ibid).

Therefore, in Spinoza’s view, our greatest good is not the sort of thing that is subject to natural scarcity, nor need it be the object of competition. Rather, it is “common to all, and can be enjoyed by all equally” (E4p36). And because, in Spinoza’s view, other humans are more useful to us to the extent that they are rational (E4p35c1), it is entirely to our benefit when others pursue the same good—understanding—that we ourselves seek; for detailed exposition of Spinoza’s argument that it is to our benefit to pursue the good of others, see Della Rocca (2004, 125–8), Kisner (2009), and Grey (2013). This is why Spinoza thinks humans have a rational impetus to act in moral (that is, benevolent) ways toward others from a starting point of pure self-interest: “The desire to do good generated in us by our living according to the guidance of reason, I call morality” (E4p37s1).

ii. Spinoza’s Contractarianism

So far, Spinoza’s moral theory might not appear to be capable of answering the practical questions it is ordinarily hoped such a theory will answer. The conception of the good just outlined is so strikingly focused on human intellectual life that the resulting moral theory may seem far removed from ordinary moral matters. However, Spinoza has a bit more to say about morality beyond his claim that it is constituted by the pursuit of knowledge of God and the desire to do good for others. One important strand of Spinoza’s moral thought is a version of moral contractarianism, the view that we may become normatively bound to behave in certain ways on the basis of agreements or contracts we make when we live in society with others. His version of contractarianism is heavily influenced by Hobbes, from whom Spinoza appears to have drawn a number of key ideas. (This article deals only briefly with those aspects of Spinoza’s contractarianism that bear upon morality; see the article on Spinoza’s Political Philosophy for more information about this topic.)

It might seem surprising that Spinoza thinks humans need to live in society at all. Given that our greatest good is knowledge of God, ought we not all retreat to the mountaintop and spend our time in metaphysical inquiry? Spinoza’s reason for denying this is his pessimistic view of the prospects for humans overcoming all of their passions. Even the wisest philosopher requires assistance from her community in the pursuit of her greatest good. On this point, Spinoza disagrees with Descartes, who holds that “Even those who have the weakest souls could acquire absolute mastery over all their passions” (CSM I, 348). Spinoza’s view, by contrast, is that on account of the force of their passions, people “are often drawn in different directions and are contrary to one another, while they require one another’s aid” (E4p37s2, citations elided), and that these passions can never completely be overcome. Thus even the most wise and temperate among us has reason to enter a social contract. Because of our need for one another’s aid—whether to study philosophy or gain security—we have reason to live together with others in society. And because it is extremely difficult to moderate and restrain people’s worst passions, we cannot enjoy the benefits of civil society without entering a social contract.

With this observation in the background, the argument for moral contractarianism appears in a very abbreviated form in a scholium in the Ethics:

In order, therefore, that men may be able to live harmoniously and be of assistance to one another, it is necessary for them to give up their natural right and to make one another confident that they will do nothing which could harm others… By this law, therefore, society can be maintained, provided it appropriates to itself the right everyone has of avenging himself, and of judging good and evil. (E4p37s2, G II/237–8)

The argument is one commonly associated with classical social contract theories. Because humans are unable to live peacefully with one another so long as they retain their natural right to act as they please, it is in each person’s best interest to give up that right to the state, on the condition that everyone else does the same.

For this reason, Spinoza holds the prima facie surprising view that laws are morally binding on us even in cases in which those laws are not rational. In conflicts between the laws of our society and the dictates of our reason, the laws win out. Likewise, although in the context of his metaphysics, Spinoza treats evil and sin as functions of an individual’s power; when he is writing about such things in the context of civil society, he provides a very different picture. For example, he writes, “[E]veryone is bound to submit to the state. Sin, therefore, is nothing but disobedience…” (E4p37s2, G II/238); “A wrong occurs when a citizen or subject is forced to suffer some injury at the hands of another…contrary to the edict of the sovereign power” (TTP Ch. 16, 179). Why does law figure so prominently in discussions of morality in the context of civil society? In his Theological-Political Treatise, where he develops these ideas at length, Spinoza argues, “it is our duty [tenemur] to carry out all the orders of the sovereign power without exception, even if those orders are quite irrational. For reason bids us carry out even such orders so as to choose the lesser of two evils” (TTP Ch. 16, 177). The argument is that even if we recognize what is required by law to be irrational, it cannot be as irrational as it would be to violate the law, and thereby to become “enemies of the state and to act against reason which urges us to uphold the state with all our might” (ibid).

iii. Spinoza’s Virtue Theory and the “Free Man”

Another way in which Spinoza attempts to make his moral theory easier to put into practice is by providing a virtue theory based on it. Spinoza spends the latter sections of part of the Ethics developing a virtue theory of a fairly traditional sort, outlining which character traits and behaviors are virtues, and which are vices, in the conception of morality he has developed. He concludes this part of the work with some claims “concerning the free man’s temperament and manner of living,” where the “free man” is understood to be someone who lives wholly according to the guidance of reason. Since the very idea of a human being who lives wholly according to the guidance of reason is apparently contradictory—Spinoza has earlier observed that “man is necessarily always subject to passions” (E4p4c)—the discussion of the free man is not properly understood as describing an attainable goal. However, many scholars (such as Garrett [1990, 229–30] and Nadler [2006, 219]) take this discussion of the free man to be Spinoza’s presentation of the model of human nature he promised in the preface to Ethics 4. If so, then the description of the free man may best be seen as a guiding ideal, a character that ordinary people should aspire to be like, at least insofar as they are able.

Spinoza’s description of the free man’s way of living is based upon his account of virtues: if a character trait is grounded in our reason and our pursuit of understanding, it is a virtue; if it is grounded in our passions or ignorance, it is a vice. These considerations are clearly rooted in his conception of our greatest good (as outlined above). Although Spinoza’s treatment of many of the virtues is in keeping with traditional conceptions of virtue, he often parts ways with these traditional conceptions. For example, his conclusion that tenacity and nobility are virtues is in keeping with tradition. (Why are they virtues? Tenacity, he says, is the character trait corresponding to our rational striving for self-preservation, and nobility is the character trait corresponding to our rational striving for the benefit of others [E3p59s]. So both character traits are grounded in reason, not the passions.) However, Spinoza also argues that humility, repentance, and pity—character traits highly esteemed by traditional religious authorities—are not virtues, for they are “useless” and “do not arise from reason” (E4p50, 53, and 54). In his view, these character traits are not really virtues even if they do occasionally cause us to pursue the good, for they are only accidentally connected to the pursuit of the good. Reason, by contrast, is essentially connected to the pursuit of the good. As a result, anything good that we might be led to do out of pity (for instance), we could just as well have been led to do by reason. Being guided by pity, then, can be no better than being guided by reason. Moreover, pity always involves sadness, a form of disempowerment, so considered in itself, it is evil. Hence being guided by pity is inevitably worse than being guided by reason: “a man who lives according to the dictate of reason strives, as far as he can, not to be touched by pity” (E4p50c).

When Spinoza characterizes the “free man,” someone who lives wholly according to the guidance of reason, we should therefore expect only partial continuity with traditional conceptions of morality and virtuous living. The free man, Spinoza reasons, will pick his battles wisely, showing his virtue both in avoiding danger and in overcoming it (E4p69). He will always act honestly (E4p72). And he will seek to live in society with others rather than in solitude (E4p73). Nevertheless, the free man will graciously decline favors or gifts from those who do not follow the guidance of reason and who are ruled by their emotions (E4p70). Accepting such favors or gifts is liable to be dangerous, for the irrational gift-giver will inevitably value them more highly than the free man; the free man reserves his gratitude for the friendship of other rational people (E4p71), insofar as such friendship aids him in his pursuit of greater understanding. In practice no actual human could live exactly as the free man does, for (as mentioned in part one above) only a substance can be fully rational and active, and humans are not substances. Nevertheless Spinoza’s presentation of these claims suggests that he takes them to be desirable ways of living, because they derive from “strength of character, that is, [from] tenacity and nobility” (E4p73), the primary virtues.

c. Applications of Spinoza’s Moral Theory

In the course of developing his moral theory, Spinoza sometimes applies it in passing to what he recognizes are traditional moral problems. He is often somewhat dismissive of many of these traditional moral problems, and his treatment of them rarely includes the sort of depth they receive in works of applied moral philosophy. However, his responses to such problems are often interesting because, given the demands of other parts of his philosophical system, his proposals are often surprising and idiosyncratic. This article discusses four of them: the moral permissibility of suicide, of lying, and of causing harm to animals or to the environment.

i. Suicide and Self-Harm

One traditional moral problem regards the moral permissibility of self-harm, the ultimate case of which is suicide. Spinoza does not agree with most of the traditional religious reasons for treating suicide as a sin. For example, an explanation of the wrongness of suicide common in the Judeo-Christian religious traditions appeals to one of the Ten Commandments: “Thou Shalt Not Kill.” According to this family of explanations, suicide is a sin because it involves taking a human life, which God has commanded humans not to do. Spinoza takes the conception of God upon which this explanation relies to be false: many imagine “God as a ruler, lawgiver, king, merciful, just and so forth; whereas these are all merely attributes of human nature, and not at all applicable to the divine nature” (TTP Ch. 5, 53). God simply does not issue commandments in the way that a king issues commandments. Given this fact, Spinoza thinks, it makes little sense to try to explain moral claims like “Suicide is a sin” by appeal to such commandments.

Although he disagrees with traditional reasons for taking suicide to be immoral, he nevertheless agrees that suicide is in fact immoral. On this point, Spinoza is very clear: someone who commits suicide is “weak-minded and completely conquered by external causes contrary to their nature” (E4p18s). This conclusion is primarily a result of the conatus doctrine, since that doctrine forces Spinoza to deny that anyone can kill himself, strictly speaking. There must always be external causes that can be assigned to explain suicide or self-harm. But that is merely a descriptive claim; the evaluative claim that it is a “weak-minded” act derives from Spinoza’s ethical egoism. To be virtuous is to strive to preserve one’s being, so suicide is as far from virtue as one can go, in Spinoza’s view.

ii. Lying and Deceit

In his characterization of the “free man” at the end of part of the Ethics, Spinoza argues that a perfectly rational being “always acts honestly, not deceptively” (E4p72). The argument for this, on the face of it, anticipates Kant’s famous argument for the same conclusion. Spinoza reasons that if a perfectly rational being acted deceptively, he would do so “from the dictate of reason” (because, presumably, that is how a perfectly rational being does anything); but then it would be rational to act in that way, and “men would be better advised to agree only in words, and be contrary to one another in fact” (E4p72d). Spinoza takes this consequence to be absurd, for it is in our interest to bring others into as much agreement with our natures as possible (E4p31c), which living deceitfully would prevent.

One puzzle that this argument raises is the apparent conflict between Spinoza’s claim that a perfectly rational being would always act honestly and his claim that such a being would never do anything that brought about its own destruction. Spinoza does not explicitly attempt to resolve this problem in the Ethics, though commentators have attempted to do so on his behalf in a variety of ways (Garrett 1990, 228–33).

iii. Animal Ethics

As should not be surprising given his ethical egoism, Spinoza is not sympathetic to the thought that we ought to worry ourselves about either our treatment of animals or of the environment. With respect to animals, Spinoza writes, “the law against killing animals is based more on empty superstition and unmanly compassion than sound reason” (E4p37s1). Reason dictates that we seek out the companionship of other humans because they share our nature, and what is good for us is good for them. However, since non-human animals differ in nature from us, reason dictates that we “consider our own advantage, use them at our pleasure, and treat them as is most convenient for us” (ibid). So, in spite of the fact that Spinoza does not view humans as metaphysically privileged—for instance, he disagrees with the Cartesian view that humans, but not other animals, have minds (ibid)—he nevertheless holds that we need not concern ourselves with the welfare of non-human animals. There may be situations in which our own welfare depends upon the welfare of a non-human animal, as when a farmer’s livelihood depends upon the welfare of his stock. But only in such situations will a human have reason to care about the welfare of a non-human. That said, it is not clear that this is the view he ought to have adopted, given his first principles (Grey 2013, 378–382).

iv. Environmental Ethics

With respect to the environment, matters are less clear-cut. Spinoza does acknowledge that humans are by their nature dependent upon their environment:

It is the part of a wise man, I say, to refresh and restore himself in moderation with pleasant food and drink, with scents, with the beauty of green plants, with decoration, music, sports, the theater, and other things of this kind, which anyone can use without injury to another. For the human Body is composed of a great many parts of different natures, which constantly require new and varied nourishment… (E4p45s)

Unfortunately, after this picturesque passage, Spinoza does not go on to consider what our dependence upon our environment might entail with regard to our treatment of it. Much of our concern regarding environmental ethics today is based on our recognition that the environment is not an inexhaustible source of nourishment and wealth; to a seventeenth-century author, this possibility would have seemed bizarre.

That being said, Spinoza’s views about animal ethics can be applied more or less directly to the environment as well. It would be irrational to work to preserve the environment for its own sake, since what is good for the environment is not necessarily good for us. However, insofar as we are concerned for the well-being of ourselves and other humans, and we recognize that well-being to depend upon the environment, it will be rational for us to preserve the environment—not for its sake, but for ours. This thought is at least hinted at in the quoted passage, where Spinoza notes that we are to “refresh and restore” ourselves only using means that “anyone can use without injury to another.” Insofar as the production of our “pleasant food and drink” turns out to cause injury to the environment upon which our neighbors (or we ourselves) depend, the practice would be open to moral criticism.

Some, such as Naess (1977), have gone further than this, arguing that Spinoza’s system provides a hospitable metaphysical background for ecology. However, as Kober (2013, 58–9) notes, one of the consequences of Spinoza’s views is that important conceptual tools of ecology lose their purchase. For example, Spinoza allows no distinction between what is natural and what is artificial. And, more importantly, there is no sense to be made of the designation of certain types of human activities as exploitative of the environment or of animals.

3. Spinoza’s Remedies for the Passions

In the 17^th century, moral philosophy was not yet primarily preoccupied with either accounting for the nature and origins of morality or with establishing general principles governing moral obligation—though, as we have seen, Spinoza does develop some views on these topics en route to the final part of the Ethics. Rather, in this period, one of the central aims of moral philosophy was to provide the reader with psychological tools that could be used to cultivate desirable states of being. For this reason, seventeenth-century texts on moral philosophy tend to be more akin to self-help books than to twenty-first century moral philosophy. The first half of Ethics V exemplifies this tendency. There, Spinoza attempts to provide a guide to how to train our minds in order to “bring it about that we are not easily affected with evil affects” (E5p10s).

‘Passion’ [passio] is a technical term for which Spinoza provides a careful definition. He writes, “An affect which is called a passion of the mind is a confused idea, by which the mind affirms of its body, or of some part of it, a greater or lesser force of existing than before, which, when it is given, determines the mind to think of this rather than that” (EIII Gen. Def. of Aff., G II/203–4). This definition connects the passions to his theory of ideas, since all passions are confused ideas. It also connects the passions to the conatus doctrine: the passions represent changes in the body’s “force of existing” [existendi vim], and this force of existing is presumably the same force introduced in his discussion of the innate striving of all things to persevere in existing (see section 1 above).

Spinoza appeals to both of these pieces of theoretical machinery, along with a few interesting additions, when he presents his five remedies for overcoming or restraining the passions. It is worth noting that although the view that we should strive to diminish the strength of our emotions has a very Stoic ring to it, he expressly distances himself from the Stoics. His reason for this is their belief “that the emotions depended absolutely on our will, and that we could absolutely govern them” (E5pref), which Spinoza thinks involves a misunderstanding of the structure and powers of the human mind. This comes out in his remedies for the passions: of the five remedies, only two (the first and fifth) are plausibly activities that we can perform intentionally.

a. Via Knowledge of the Affects

Spinoza claims that whenever we “form a clear and distinct idea” of a passion, it will no longer be a passion (E5p3). Since all passions are confused ideas—indeed, this is a core component of the definition of a passion—the most straightforward way to eliminate a passion is to eliminate the confusion that is the basis for that passion. In Spinoza’s view, the idea of an idea is not really distinct from the idea itself (E2p21s), so the clear and distinct idea we form of a passionate affect is not really distinct from that affect. But, since the clear and distinct idea is not confused, to conceive of it in this way is to eliminate the confusion from the original passion. Once we have eliminated this confusion, “the affect will cease to be a passion” (ibid). This approach to overcoming a passion does not eliminate the affect that constitutes the passion, but merely eliminates that feature of the affect in virtue of which it constituted a passion. The confusion a passionate affect involves is not intrinsic to that affect, in Spinoza’s view, and when that confusion is stripped away, the affect nevertheless remains.

Spinoza does not say much to clarify how this procedure is supposed to work. However, in at least one of Spinoza’s accounts of confusion, to say that an idea is confused is to say that it is partly determined by external causes (E2p29s). Thus, to strip away the confusion from a passion would require one somehow to strip away some of its causes. But that possibility appears to be inconsistent with Spinoza’s conception of causation, according to which an effect must be understood through its causes (Lin [2009, 270]; Bennett [1984, 336]). Scholars remain divided as to whether this difficulty, commonly referred to as the Changing Problem, is surmountable; see Marshall (2012) for some proposed solutions on Spinoza’s behalf.

b. Via Removing the Idea of an External Cause

All inadequate ideas have external causes (E3p1), so all passions are guaranteed to have external causes as well. In some cases, a passion not only has an external cause, but is such that it represents that cause (or purported cause). For example, love is joy accompanied by the idea of an external cause of that joy (E3 Def. of Affs. VI, G II/192). That is, the passion of love is a composite idea, and its parts are (i) joy, and (ii) the representation of something external as producing that joy. In such cases, we can destroy the passion by mentally separating the idea of the external cause that it includes. As Spinoza puts it: “For what constitutes the form of [such passions] is joy, or sadness, accompanied by an external cause… So if this is taken away, the form of love or hate is taken away at the same time. Hence, these affects, and those arising from them, are destroyed” (E5p2d).

c. Via the Endurance of Rational Affects

Spinoza’s third remedy for overcoming the passions is less a method than an observation about a natural consequence of our emotional psychology. One factor that determines the force with which an emotion strikes us is whether we conceive of its cause as present. For instance, Spinoza writes, “An affect whose cause we imagine to be with us in the present is stronger than if we did not imagine it to be with us” (E4p9). Examples of this phenomenon are abundant. Whether snakes are present or absent, Yetta fears them. However, if she thinks snakes are present, that fact serves to fuel her fear; and if she thinks them absent, her fear is greatly diminished. Affects that are produced by ordinary external objects—fear of snakes, love for one’s car, desire for pie, and so forth—all naturally vacillate in force over time based on whether we take their objects to be present or absent.

By contrast, affects “arising from or aroused by reason” (E5p7) have a very different profile. The object of such an affect is “necessarily related to the common properties of things” (E5p7d), which are pervasive features of reality, such as the property of being extended. In Spinoza’s view, “we always regard [such properties] as present,” and we “always imagine [them] in the same way” (ibid). So, such an affect will endure over a longer period of time, and with a more constant degree of force, than affects produced by external things. In the long run, Spinoza thinks, irrational affects will be forced to “accommodate themselves” more and more frequently to the rational affects. In this way, we will naturally tend over time toward rational affects and away from irrational ones. Spinoza’s line of argument here is thus aimed at defending the consoling thought that reason will tend to win out, rather than at providing a technique we can apply to help reason win out.

d. Via the Multiplicity of the Causes of Rational Affects

Recall from section 2 that Spinoza takes the greatest good for all humans to be knowledge of God. Fortunately, the idea of God is one that we “really fully possess” (E5p20s, G II/294; cf. E2p45), and so our greatest good can be realized. Indeed, since everything in nature is a mode of God, in Spinoza’s view, the skilled philosopher can revive and meditate upon the idea of God on the basis of any experience whatsoever; every experience can occasion a train of thought that leads the mind back to its greatest good, and the joy that it brings. But these facts suggest a fourth way in which we may diminish the force of our passions, namely by means of “the multiplicity of causes by which affections related to common properties or to God are encouraged” (E5p20s, G II/293).

As with the third method, Spinoza here has in mind the comparative force of rational affections over irrational ones. While the third remedy appeals to Spinoza’s view that the objects of rational affections are constant and unchanging, the fourth remedy appeals to his view that the causes of rational affections are universal and omnipresent. This is relevant because Spinoza holds that

[A]s an image, or affect, is related to more things, there are more causes by which it can be aroused and encouraged, all of which the mind…considers together as a result of the affect itself. And so the affect is the more frequent, or flourishes more often, and engages the mind more. (E5p11d)

This is another way in which rational affects gradually become stronger and eventually may overpower the passionate affects. Passionate affects may be very strong for as long as their cause is present, but rational affects—in particular, the desire for knowledge and the love of God—have innumerably more and greater causes, and so rational affects will “flourish more often, and engage the mind more” than passionate ones (ibid).

e. Via the Re-Ordering of the Affects

The final remedy Spinoza offers is unlike the previous two in that it is an activity that we can intentionally perform to diminish the force of our passions. It is based upon the power that he believes the human mind has to intentionally join two ideas to one another by frequently thinking about them in unison, so that when the first idea occurs, the second idea is naturally aroused in the mind as well. One of the ways in which we may apply this power is by intentionally joining passionate affects together with mottos or rules, “sure maxims of life,” that are rational to follow whenever those passions take hold of us (E5p10s, G II/287).

Spinoza uses several examples to flesh out how this remedy is supposed to work; the main example he uses is the maxim “that hate is to be conquered by love, or nobility, not by repaying it with hate in return” (ibid). He writes,

[W]e ought to think about and meditate frequently on the common wrongs of men, and how they may be warded off best by nobility. For if we join the image of a wrong to the imagination of this maxim, it will always be ready for us…when wrong is done to us. (E5p10s, G II/288)

We originally determine that nobility is a virtue by means of rational inquiry. However, we are not best served by attempting to recreate the chain of reasoning that would lead us to act nobly when someone insults or harms us, but rather by having that maxim firmly committed to memory. Spinoza is admitting that in the heat of the moment, we are unlikely to be able to simply reason our way out of passion. But by means of carefully arranging the thoughts our passions are associated with in advance, we can ensure that “the wrong, or hate usually arising from [another’s wronging us], will occupy a very small part of the imagination, and will be easily overcome” (ibid).

In this way, a person may intentionally use irrational processes (memory and imagination) to safeguard his ability to act rationally: “he who will observe these [rules] carefully…and practice them, will soon be able to direct most of his actions according to the command of reason” (E5p10s, G II/289). By training ourselves to react in ways that, in our calmer, dispassionate moments, we recognize to be rational, we will be prepared to respond appropriately even when we lack time for reflection. This appears to connect to Spinoza’s claim in the preface to Ethics 4 that we ought to cultivate and hold before ourselves an idealized human being whom we can model our own behavior upon (discussed in section 2.3). Based on passages such as this, scholarship on Spinoza’s ethical theory has tended to depart from the traditional picture of imagination as something to be transcended through the use of reason; see, for example, Soyarslan (2014, 243–7), Steinberg (2014, 187–192) and James (2014, 154–159). Although Spinoza may rightly be called a rationalist in a number of senses, his account of how we achieve “freedom of mind, or blessedness” (E5pref) appears to depend as much on non-rational powers of imagination and memory as it does on reason.

4. Conclusion

In Spinoza’s view, human moral judgments are grounded in human desires or beliefs. However, in spite of this anti-realist metaethics, Spinoza endorses an intellectualist version of ethical egoism: reason dictates that we seek our greatest good, and this greatest good is understanding. He further tempers his ethical egoism by endorsing a version of contractarianism, according to which we may be bound to obey laws even when we recognize them to be irrational, and they seem to hinder our efforts to seek our greatest good, since the alternative (living without the help of civil society) will always be far worse. Finally, to aid us in the pursuit of understanding, which is often hindered by our passions, Spinoza provides a series of “remedies” by which the force of the passions may be mitigated.

Thus, in spite of the fact that Spinoza initially appears to have no interest in our contemporary notion of moral philosophy, the moral theory he develops has a surprising degree of depth and nuance. Indeed, since he builds his account of morality on top of a thoroughly naturalistic conception of the world, and of humanity’s place in it—and since our desire not to be mastered by our passions remains as strong today as it was in the 17^th century—Spinoza’s moral philosophy remains alive for us today.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Passages from Spinoza’s Ethics are cited in the usual way. For example, ‘E1p25’ refers to Ethics part 1 proposition 25; ‘E1p25d’ refers to the demonstration of that proposition; ‘E1p25s’ to its scholium; and ‘E1p125c’ to its corollary. Reference to the Gebhardt edition page numbers is provided where the usual citation would refer to a span of more than one page.

Descartes, Rene. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes [vols. I–II], eds. J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff, and D. Murdoch. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985). [CSM]
Hobbes, Thomas. Leviathan, with selected variants from the Latin edition of 1668, ed. E. Curley. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1994). [L]
Spinoza, Benedict de. Opera, ed. C. Gebhardt. (Heidelberg: Carl Winters Universitätsverlag, 1925). [G]
Spinoza, Benedict de. The Collected Works of Spinoza, ed. and trans. E. Curley. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988). [E]
Spinoza, Benedict de. The Letters, ed. and trans. S. Shirley. (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 1995). [Ep.]
Spinoza, Benedict de. Theological-Political Treatise, ed. and trans. S. Shirley. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1998). [TTP]

b. Secondary Sources

Bennett, Jonathan. A Study of Spinoza’s Ethics. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1984).
Curley, Edwin. Behind the Geometrical Method. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988).
Curley, Edwin. “Spinoza’s Moral Philosophy.” In Spinoza: A Collection of Critical Essays, ed. M. Grene (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1979), 354–376.
Della Rocca, Michael. “Egoism and the Imitation of the Affects in Spinoza.” In Spinoza on Reason and the ‘Free Man’: The Jerusalem Conference [vol. 4], eds. Y. Yovel and G. Segal. (New York: Little Room Press, 2004), 123–147.
Garrett, Don. “Spinoza’s ethical theory.” In Cambridge Companion to Spinoza, ed. D. Garrett. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996), 267–314.
Garrett, Don. “‘A Free Man Always Acts Honestly, Not Deceptively’: Freedom and the Good in Spinoza’s Ethics.” In Spinoza: Issues and Directions, eds. E. Curley and P. F. Moreau (Leiden: Brill, 1990), 221–38.
Grey, John. “Spinoza on Composition, Causation, and the Mind’s Eternity.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 22(3), 2014: 446–467.
Grey, John. “‘Use Them At Our Pleasure’: Spinoza on Animal Ethics.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 30(4), 2013: 367–388.
Hübner, Karolina. “Spinoza on Being Human and Human Perfection.” In Essays on Spinoza’s Ethical Theory, eds. M. Kisner and A. Youpa. (Oxford: OUP, 2014), 124–142.
James, Susan. “Spinoza, the Body, and the Good Life.” In Essays on Spinoza’s Ethical Theory, eds. M. Kisner and A. Youpa. (Oxford: OUP, 2014), 143–159.
Kisner, Matthew. Spinoza on Human Freedom: Reason, Autonomy, and the Good Life. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2011).
Kisner, Matthew. “Spinoza’s Benevolence: The Rational Basis of Acting for the Benefit of Others.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 47(4), 2009: 549–567.
Kisner, Matthew and Andrew Youpa (eds.). Essays on Spinoza’s Ethical Theory. (Oxford: OUP, 2014).
Kober, Gal. “For They Do Not Agree In Nature: Spinoza and Deep Ecology.” Ethics and the Environment 18(1), 2013: 43–65.
Lebuffe, Michael. From Bondage to Freedom: Spinoza on Human Excellence. (Oxford: OUP, 2010).
Lebuffe, Michael. “Spinoza’s Normative Ethics.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 37(3), 2007: 371–392.
Lin, Martin. “The Power of Reason in Spinoza.” In Cambridge Companion to Spinoza’s Ethics, ed. O. Koistinen. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009), 258–283.
Marshall, Colin. “Spinoza on Destroying Passions with Reason.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 85(1), 2012: 139–160.
Melamed, Yitzhak. “Spinoza’s Anti-Humanism: An Outline.” In The Rationalists: Between Tradition and Innovation, eds. C. Fraenkel, D. Perinetti, and J. E. H. Smith. (Boston: Kluwer, 2011), 147–166.
Nadler, Steven. Spinoza’s Ethics: An Introduction. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006).
Naess, Arne. “Spinoza and Ecology.” Philosophia 7, 1977: 45–54.
Rutherford, Donald. “Spinoza and the Dictates of Reason.” Inquiry 51(5), 2008: 485–511.
Soyarslan, Sanem. “From Ordinary Life to Blessedness.” In Essays on Spinoza’s Ethical Theory, eds. M. Kisner and A. Youpa. (Oxford: OUP, 2014), 236–257.
Steinberg, Justin. “Following a Recta Ratio Vivendi: The Practical Utility of Spinoza’s Dictates of Reason.” In Essays on Spinoza’s Ethical Theory, eds. M. Kisner and A. Youpa. (Oxford: OUP, 2014), 178–196.
Verbeek, Theo. Spinoza’s Theologico-Political Treatise: Exploring ‘The Will of God’. (Burlington, VT: Ashgate, 2003).
Wilson, Catherine. “The Strange Hybridity of Spinoza’s Ethics.” In Early Modern Philosophy, eds. C. Mercer and E. O’Neill. (Oxford: OUP, 2005), 86–99.
Youpa, Andrew. “Spinoza’s Theories of Value.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 18(2), 2010: 209–229.
Youpa, Andrew. “Spinoza’s Theory of the Good.” In Cambridge Companion to Spinoza’s Ethics, ed. O. Koistinen. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009), 242–57.

Author Information

John Grey
Email: jrtgrey@gmail.com
Michigan State University
U. S. A.

Totalitarianism

Totalitarianism is best understood as any system of political ideas that is both thoroughly dictatorial and utopian. It is an ideal type of governing notion, and as such, it cannot be realised perfectly.

Faced with the brutal reality of paradigmatic cases like Stalin’s USSR and Nazi Germany, philosophers, political theorists and social scientists have felt not just intellectually motivated but morally compelled to explain the causes and implications of totalitarianism. This has been in part an attempt to explain the socio-political phenomenon in itself, as well to develop an intellectual tool in the arsenal of democracy.

Diverse philosophical perspectives have been employed. They share the important common denominator of an appeal to the value of human life, critical thought, and a pluralistic society. Many of the key figures among the anti-totalitarian thinkers discussed here were European Jewish refugees who escaped totalitarian systems. Many who work on this question have been motivated by a desire to come to grips, philosophically, with what is undoubtedly the greatest intellectual justification for mass murder in history: the twentieth century totalitarian state.

Introduction
Second World War and Cold War Thought
Later Work
1. Judith Shklar’s Liberalism of Fear
2. Avishai Margalit on the Decent Society and Totalitarianism
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The term “totalitarianism” dates to the fascist era of the 1920s and 1930s, and it was first used and popularised by Italian fascist theorists, including Giovanni Gentile. It progressively came to be extended to include not just extreme utopian dictatorships of the far right, but also Communist regimes, especially that of the Soviet Union under Joseph Stalin. It is still frequently associated with Cold War thought of the 1940s and 1950s, a period during which it was most widely utilised as a governing concept, although its philosophical implications transcend that era’s political fears and rhetoric. As used in this article, “totalitarianism” will refer to the most extreme modern dictatorships possessing perfectionistic and utopian conceptions of humanity and society.

Totalitarianism’s appeal is linked to a variety of perennial values and intellectual commitments. Although a distinctly modern problem, proto-totalitarian notions may be found in a variety of philosophical and political systems. In particular, Plato’s utopian society discussed in the Republic featured a caste-based society in which both social and moral order are to be maintained and fostered through strict political control and eugenics.

In the seventeenth century, absolutists and royalists such as Thomas Hobbes and Jacques Bossuet advocated, in various ways, a strong centralized state as a guarantor against chaos in conformity with natural law and biblical precedent. However, it was only in the early twentieth century that totalitarianism, properly understood, became a conceptual and political reality. Thinkers as diverse as Carl Schmitt in Germany and Giovanni Gentile in Italy helped to lay the foundations of fascist ideology, stressing the defensive and unifying advantages of dictatorship. In the nascent USSR, Vladimir Lenin developed Marx’s ideas from a potentially totalitarian base into a full blown communist ideology, in which Marx’s own phrase “the dictatorship of the proletariat” was interpreted explicitly to mean the dictatorship of the Soviet Communist Party.

The term “totalitarianism” is also sometimes used to refer to movements that in one way or another manifest extreme dictatorial and fanatical methods, such as cults and forms of religious extremism, and it remains controversial in scope. It has been a topic of interdisciplinary interest, with various typologies offered by political scientists (see Friedrich and Brzezinski 1956 for the locus classicus of such approaches).

This article will primarily examine some key models and criticisms of the problem of totalitarianism defended by preeminent philosophers, as well as the thoughts of some key and representative scholars in other disciplines whose work is of philosophical significance. Their perspectival range encompasses strongly liberal, intellectual historical, neo-Marxist and pragmatist approaches. All have wished to distinguish totalitarianism sharply from liberal democratic ideals and society.

2. Second World War and Cold War Thought

a. The American Pragmatists on the Values of Pluralism and Democratic Debate

It is by no means surprising that American pragmatists should have responded to the challenge of totalitarianism in the mid-twentieth century. Not just Cold War realities, but philosophical method and values were key factors in this response. Given its strong emphasis on experimental method and the value of individual experience and fallibilism in epistemology, pragmatism would seem prima facie inimical to dictatorship.

i. John Dewey on Democratic Method

Philosophy, in order to be at its best, requires both critical thinking and democratic action, on any interpretation of Dewey’s pragmatism. In a number of works published between the 1930s and his death in 1952, John Dewey felt compelled to defend democracy against the growth and expansionism of totalitarianism, and this engagement was in keeping with Dewey’s passion for social activism and public education over the course of his long life. Dewey’s action on this matter included chairing the 1937 Dewey Commission that critically examined Soviet charges against Leon Trotsky.

Dewey had been interested in the problems of democracy for some time when he wrote his 1939 democratic credo I Believe. The rapid expansion of fascism and the Soviet Great Purge of the mid to late 1930s alerted Dewey to imminent threats to individual freedom from diverse quarters. In this short work, Dewey stated that he felt compelled to emphasize the fundamental value and importance of individuals over the state in the face of creeping totalitarianism. He here affirmed the pragmatist conviction that experience and institutions tempered by democratic problem solving ought to be primary in social philosophy. Dewey held that such problem solving, in order to be ethically compelling, must be respectful of the fundamental primacy of individual rights. It must furthermore involve an important element of negotiation and compromise over dogmatic assertion.

Furthermore, Dewey held that the rise of modern dictatorships was in part a reaction to an excessive form of individualism that isolated human beings from each other, and that offered only modern capitalism in mass society as a choice:

The negative and empty character of this individualism had consequences which produced a reaction toward an equally arbitrary and one-sided collectivism. This reaction is identical with the rise of the new form of political despotism. The decline of democracy and the rise of authoritarian states which claim they can do for individuals what the latter cannot by any possibility do for themselves are the two sides of one and the same indivisible picture.

Political collectivism is now marked in all highly industrialized countries, even when it does not reach the extreme of the totalitarian state….[the individual] is told that he must make his choice between big industry and finance and the big national political state. (Dewey, 1993: 235-236).

ii. Sidney Hook on Heresy versus Conspiracy

Sidney Hook was Dewey’s prime disciple in the application of pragmatism to anti-totalitarian thought. In his highly controversial 1953 book, Heresy, Yes—Conspiracy, No, Hook incurred the allegation of McCarthyism due to his advocacy of a firm line against the American Communist Party, especially within academia and educational trade unions.

Hook, who was social democratic for much of his career, distinguished between a genuinely progressive left that operates in a heretical and democratic matter, and the Stalinist American Communist Party and its fellow travellers. Heresy, for Hook, is an entirely legitimate expression of dissent on controversial matters. However, he held the Communist movement to be inherently conspiratorial and subversive of the very ground rules of democracy, and this led him to advocate restrictions against its carrying out policies and actions inimical to elected government. In effect, Hook affirmed the legitimacy of democracy protecting itself not just from external aggression, but from internal subversion in the interest of foreign aggressors, such as the USSR. He took this to be in keeping with the pragmatist emphasis on democratic consensus and open debate in the interest of solving social problems, a methodology diametrically opposed to Stalinism.

Hook’s core thesis of muscular liberalism is powerfully stated in a New York Times Magazine article subsequently expanded into a 1953 book:

Liberalism in the twentieth century must toughen its fibre, for it is engaged in a struggle on many fronts. Liberalism must defend the free market in ideas against the racists, the professional patrioteer, and those spokesmen of the status quo who would freeze the existing inequalities of opportunity and economic power by choking off criticism.

Liberals must also defend freedom of ideas against those agents and apologists of Communist totalitarianism, who, instead of honestly defending their heresies, resort to conspiratorial methods of anonymity and other methods of fifth columnists. (Hook, 1950: 143).

The usual objections to pragmatism are pertinent to its Deweyan anti-totalitarian strain. These revolve around the claims that pragmatism has an insufficiently robust and general conception of truth and evidence to serve as an adequate foundation for ethical and political principles. Ethical foundationalists in particular, have rejected pragmatism as possessing excessively relativistic implications, and for lacking a strong sense of moral tradition.

Contemporary pragmatists have, in different ways, attempted to respond to such criticisms by stressing the great value of democratic society in upholding value pluralism and open-ended inquiry:

…democracy is not just one form of social life among other workable forms of social life; it is the precondition for the full application of intelligence to the solution of social problems. (Putnam, 1992: 180).

Whether or not pragmatist anti-totalitarianism succeeds in its defence of democracy and individual rights is thus deeply linked to the coherence and adequacy of pragmatist defenses of a fallibilistic and at times flexible conception of truth in ethics and politics. If there is no need for traditional ethical foundationalism in upholding the value of democracy against tyranny, then the pragmatist case against totalitarianism may be seen to be a serious methodological option.

b. The British Liberal Defence of the Open Society and Pluralism

Although both Karl Popper and Isaiah Berlin were born outside of Great Britain, they were both leading theorists of anti-totalitarianism in British academia. The Israeli scholar, Jacob L. Talmon, was British trained, and is best seen as applying the British liberal tradition to the Enlightenment. There are clear affinities between their positions on this issue, which are best seen as continuations of the British liberal tradition well into the twentieth century, when it faced the challenge of the totalitarian state. The three representatives of British liberalism discussed here shared a commitment to individual liberty, wariness of state power, and an evident suspicion of what they took to be the collectivist and utopian excesses of various Continental thinkers.

i. Karl Popper’s Indictment of Historicism

In several works, Karl Popper articulated a vigorous defence of liberal democracy over dictatorship. In his early work there is a particular emphasis on the unscientific and ultimately illogical character of all forms of historical determinism and collectivism. In The Poverty of Historicism, he stressed the philosophical errors of utopianism, and what he termed “historicism”—assuming or attempting to argue for the existence of deterministic historical laws, and the possibility of deriving accurate predictions from them. These predictions are purportedly scientific or metaphysical, and for Popper, they betray an epistemic confusion between falsifiable and limited predictions based on evidence, and “oracular prophesies” masquerading as science or philosophical rationality.

In keeping with his philosophy of natural science, Popper urges us to shun certainty and dogmatism in social science and history, in favour of a piecemeal approach characterised by attention to particulars and the trial and error methods of fallibilism. Such an approach is not only conducive to precise and clear social explanations; Popper defends it as a philosophical shield against tyranny as well. For it is precisely the immodesty of overgeneralising to alleged rigid laws in history that has led even great philosophers and other thinkers to commit the error of historicism, which is a key component of totalitarian and fanatical patterns of thought.

Popper defines “historicism” as a theory of history that affirms the existence of deterministic laws from which iron-clad predictions can be derived. He thus accuses purportedly scientific theorists of history, including Karl Marx, of misinterpreting trends as inexorable laws, thereby producing unscientific and potentially irrational schemes of historical development. When coupled with grandiose or holistic schemes of social engineering, such approaches, for Popper, combine bad social science with lethal utopianism. We ought, he claims, to opt for “piecemeal engineering” employing trial and error experimentation, openness to constructive criticism, and the falsification of our programs:

[commitment to holistic or utopian social engineering] prejudices the Utopianist against certain sociological hypotheses which state limits to institutional control….problems connected with the uncertainty of the human factor must force the Utopianist, whether he likes it or not, to try to control the human factor by institutional means, and to extend his programme, so as to embrace not only the transformation of society, according to plan, but also the transformation of man. (Popper, 1960: 69-70).

Although written slightly later than The Poverty of Historicism, Popper’s The Open Society and its Enemies was published during the Second World War. It is therefore best seen as an intellectual contribution to the Allied cause against fascism, which was subsequently readily adapted to the struggle against Soviet dictatorship during the Cold War. Both works are permeated by a sense that democracy was under fire and could potentially be annihilated by its totalitarian rivals.

Here Popper broadens his critique of totalitarianism by indicting major figures of the Western philosophical tradition, notably Plato, Hegel and Marx. All three, he held, were guilty of collectivist and utopian social projects. In diverse ways, Plato’s notion of guardianship and the philosopher kings, Hegel’s glorification of the militaristic nation state, and Marx’s belief in the inevitability of class warfare and violent revolution all share a misguided common denominator: the historicist belief in holistic explanations derived from alleged laws of historical inevitability. In place of this, Popper recommended a non-dogmatic “critical rationalism,” within an open society that respects debate and a quest for truth and knowledge. This method ought to at all costs be substituted for historicist and utopian grand schemes of social science and philosophy of history that are characterised by a kind of oracular faith in their own future prophesies, dogmatism, and immunity to falsification.

Popper explained the appeal of historicism as a product of a false conception of the power of social science and historiography, combined with alienation and dissatisfaction:

Why do all these social philosophies support the revolt against civilization? And what is the secret of their popularity? Why do they attract and seduce so many intellectuals? I am inclined to think that the reason is that they give expression to a deep felt dissatisfaction with a world which does not, and cannot, live up to our moral ideals and to our dreams of perfection. The tendency of historicism (and of related views) to support the revolt against civilization may be due to the fact that historicism itself is, largely, a reaction against the strain of our civilization and its demand for personal responsibility. (Popper, 2011: xxxix).

Popper’s faith in rationalism and the open society has been criticised by Leszek Kołakowski for not taking into account democracies’ propensity towards self-destruction. Kolakowski holds that the diverse ends of open societies can come into conflict with each other, thereby vitiating attempts to combine liberal values coherently. He writes of Popper’s model:

The open society is described less as a state constitution and more as a collection of values, among which tolerance, rationality, and a lack of commitment to tradition appear at the top of the list. It is assumed, naively so I think, that this set is wholly free of contradictions, meaning that the values that it comprises support each other in all circumstances or at least do not limit each other. (Kołakowski, 1990: 164).

This criticism points to the question of value pluralism as discussed by Isaiah Berlin: how can a multiplicity of values, some of them potentially mutually exclusive, provide a coherent and adequate buffer against repressive, totalitarian state power?

ii. Isaiah Berlin on Liberty

Throughout his career, Isaiah Berlin devoted a considerable amount of attention to the question of totalitarianism. He saw it as one of the most important features of twentieth century history, and as the logical outcome of an excessive devotion to what he took to be a dangerously paternalistic conception of liberty.

In a key work on the subject (1969, reprinted and expanded in 2002), Berlin drew an important distinction between the negative and positive conceptions of liberty or freedom:

The first of these political senses of freedom or liberty…which (following much precedent) I shall call the “negative sense,” is involved in the answer to the question “What is the area within which the subject—a person or group of persons—is or should be left to do or be what he is able to do or be, without interference by other persons?” The second, which I shall call the “positive” sense, is involved in the answer to the question ‘What, or who, is the source of control or interference that can determine someone to do, or be, this rather than that?’ The two questions are clearly different, even though the answers to them may overlap. (Berlin, 2002: 169).

He thus held that the former is the foundation of the pluralistic liberalism that he wished to defend, and that the latter is a very different notion, involving obligatory self-realisation through the perfection of the individual and society in accordance with natural or historical necessity. Whereas negative liberty is a cornerstone of toleration, openness to new knowledge and individual rights, positive liberty, for Berlin, is the state’s paternalistic high road to totalitarianism.

Long associated with despotic and dictatorial regimes, positive freedom had, by the mid-twentieth century, formed part of the justification for both communist and fascist dictatorships. By claiming deterministic justifications including a truly scientific conception of historical law, social Darwinism or the will of the people, totalitarian states of both the extreme left and the extreme right justified the murder of millions in the name of a unitary and static utopian future that they saw as set and predictable.

For Berlin, this totalitarian development of positive liberty was not an aberration, but a logical conclusion. It emerged in a particularly lethal form in the twentieth century due to its central role in the justification of illiberal and non-humanistic ideologies, including communism, fascism, and the sort of extreme romantic nationalism and clericalism already present prototypically in the thought of nineteenth century figures such as Joseph de Maistre.

Against this, Berlin urged humanity to seek a decent society with pluralistic values, thus eschewing utopian perfectionism. This he thought to be characterised by a fallibilistic conception of knowledge, peaceful trade-offs, and the rejection of nihilism and relativism in favour of common values across genuinely diverse ways of life. Such a society would, he held, resolve to maintain a pluralistic balance of values against any and all attempts to sacrifice entire groups of people in the name of a future that can never be fully predicted.

A key criticism of a stark division between negative and positive liberty has been offered by Charles Taylor (1985). He claims that the terms have been used in an excessively narrow way so as not to do justice to the complexity of human freedom. In particular, the existence of what he has termed “strong evaluations” (Taylor, 1985: 220). That is, important qualitative distinctions in the ranking of individuals’ desires and projects, would seem to render incomplete any use of the idea negative freedom as essentially a lack of coercion or obstacle. For Taylor, this conception of negative liberty stems from diverse and likely parallel sources in the Western philosophical tradition, such as Hobbes and Bentham. He claims that in order to do justice to freedom, even sophisticated liberals such as Mill have made significant use of concepts of self-development and improvement, and this implies some degree of positive liberty. So positive liberty is best understood as a part of individual freedom and flourishing, and not necessarily a component of totalitarianism.

The extent to which the state should promote it remains an important question. Understood along the lines indicated by Taylor, it may be a value to be realized through self-development in a more democratic society. This is in keeping with what not only Taylor, but other thinkers, claim.

iii. Jacob Talmon on Totalitarian Democracy

In 1952, Jacob L. Talmon published a liberal indictment of those views of eighteenth century thought that saw the French Enlightenment as manifesting overwhelmingly liberal tendencies.

Talmon argued, in The Origins of Totalitarian Democracy, that both liberal-empirical and totalitarian tendencies were significant and influential in European thought by the time of the French Revolution. In particular, he held that key aspects of the thought of Jean-Jacques Rousseau and lesser known radical Babouvist egalitarian Enlightenment figures such as Gabriel Bonnot de Mably, and Étienne-Gabriel Morelly, are best seen as a foreshadowing of twentieth century totalitarianism.

Like Berlin, Talmon stresses the fundamental divergence between individualist and collectivist or statist conceptions of freedom. He divided early modern democratic thought into two broad categories: “liberal” and “totalitarian” democracy. The former led, through a long process of parliamentary development across the nineteenth century, to the institutions regarded as democratic in the mid-twentieth century. The liberal democratic thought of Benjamin Constant and Alexis de Tocqueville in France, as well as John Stuart Mill in England, were instrumental in developing this political tradition to a philosophical apogee. Talmon traced its origins in part to John Locke’s defense of individual property rights. Totalitarian democracy, on the other hand, developed largely from radical French Enlightenment thought through Babeuf and the Jacobin stream of the French Revolution, and through nineteenth and early twentieth century Marxism. Talmon describes it as a form of “political Messianism.”

Liberal democracy has stressed the importance of individual human rights, empiricism and the rule of law from its beginnings. It advocates piecemeal reform and the application of rationality to arrive at optimal political remedies to social problems. Totalitarian democracy from Robespierre and the Jacobins through Karl Marx and into the twentieth century has been utopian, collectivist and statist. Talmon furthermore holds it to be characterised by historical determinism and a notion of a single comprehensible truth in political life.

The two intellectual tendencies both claim to promote freedom to the highest degree, but differ greatly in their conceptions of legitimate freedom. Both schools affirm the supreme value of liberty, but whereas the one finds the essence of freedom in spontaneity and the absence of coercion, the other believes it to be realized only in the pursuit and attainment of an absolute collective purpose. Liberal democrats believe that, in the absence of coercion, men and society may one day reach through a process of trial and error a state of ideal harmony. In the case of totalitarian democracy, this state is precisely defined, and is treated as a matter of immediate urgency, a challenge for direct action, an imminent event:

[Human beings,] in so far as they are at variance with the absolute ideal they can be ignored, coerced or intimidated into conforming, without any real violation of the democratic principle being involved. (Talmon, 1986: 2-3).

Talmon devotes considerable attention to what he takes to be Rousseau’s totalitarian tendencies in The Social Contract. Talmon finds especially collectivist Rousseau’s notion of the “general will” being over and above society and representing the highest aspirations of humanity. Furthermore, the idea that the individual can only find true liberation through the state and its supreme “Legislator” is the high road to dictatorship, for Talmon. Rousseau is thus seen as a merciless collectivist, willing to “force people to be free” in order to create a new and perfected type of human being. This ideal involves a notion of democracy as the constant and unanimous participation of the citizens of an ideal state in the acting out of the general will, thereby realising true democratic citizenship.

Talmon’s conception of the origins of totalitarianism in the French Enlightenment and its revolutionary heritage has been challenged on various grounds. The Canadian scholar C.B. Macpherson, influenced by Marxism, argued that Talmon erred in stressing ideas over class and social realities, and in thus making too strong a causal claim in linking notions of natural order and political unanimity to inevitable totalitarianism. Furthermore, he claimed that the Jacobins instituted a type of early totalitarian rule largely in response to the social pressures of revolutionary power and foreign counter-revolutionary invasion.

In effect, the true causes of historical change are thus seen as grounded in class and general social trends, and not merely in purely philosophical or ideological causes. This criticism implies holds that understanding key ideas and movements requires an understanding of their class background:

A petit-bourgeois movement like Jacobinism, or a proletarian movement still based on the same individualist assumptions (like Bavouism) is particularly liable to demand a completely general unanimity at a time when it is least possible. It might be argued that it was the petit-bourgeois character of these ideologies, rather than the assumption of a natural order, that led so readily to totalitarian dictatorship. (Macpherson, 1952: 57).

This criticism of Talmon’s core thesis bears affinities with a critique of Arendt, and it raises the general question of the social causation of ideas in an interesting way. To what extent are philosophical ideas responsible solely, or at least primarily, for mass movements throughout history, including totalitarianism? If Talmon and Arendt are right, they certainly possess sufficient causal potency to be determining factors in social and political development. If their critics hold the high ground, they have inflated the importance of secondary or even epiphenomenal notions and properties to an unrealistic station.

c. Hannah Arendt on the Origins and Implications of Totalitarianism

In her seminal 1951 book, Hannah Arendt attempted to show how totalitarianism emerged as a distinctly modern utopian problem in the twentieth century, growing out of a lethal combination of imperialism, anti-Semitism and extreme statist bureaucracies. As much a work of intellectual history as political philosophy, The Origins of Totalitarianism jarred many due to its indictment of European civilization during a period of post-war reconstruction. Arendt held that totalitarianism was not a reactionary aberration, an attempt to turn back the clock to earlier tyrannies, but rather a revolutionary form of radical evil explicable by particularly destructive tendencies in modern mass politics. The atomisation of lonely individuals and the receptivity to propaganda of mass society in the modern age makes it an ongoing temptation to be resisted through critical thinking and the affirmation of fundamental human values.

Tracing what she took to be the prime causes of totalitarianism to the nineteenth century, Arendt focused on the rise of imperialism and political anti-Semitism, and the concomitant decline of both the remnants of the feudal order and the nation state. Imperialism and anti-Semitism both drew from racist and Social Darwinist wellsprings in their repudiation of unity through language, culture, and universal rights in favour of biologically fixed and hierarchical distinctions within humanity and a struggle for world conquest. The consequent de-humanisation of entire races and ethnic groups in favour of Aryanist ideals set the grounds for fascism, with the enthusiastic support of what Arendt termed “the mob,” that is, the resentful European déclassés. Furthermore, the narrow chauvinism of pan-Slavism coupled with notions of class warfare and annihilation paved the way for a parallel communist regime of terror in the Soviet Union.

Arendt held that in both its fascist and communist varieties, the totalitarian system’s terror is not incidental, but essential. Unlike authoritarian dictatorships that strive to uphold conservative values, such regimes by their very nature aim to destroy civil society and tradition in favour of a utopian re-fashioning of humanity to suit their collectivist ideological purposes. The twentieth century totalitarian state thus emerges as a juggernaut of terror, a terror maintained in no small part by the eradication of fundamental human values and all critical thought in favour of ideology and propaganda. It thereby seeks to destroy all communal and civil institutions between it and its atomised and lonely citizens. Arendt wrote:

The ideal subject of totalitarian rule is not the convinced Nazi or the convinced Communist, but people for whom the distinction between fact and fiction (that is, the reality of experience) and the distinction between true and false (that is, the standards of thought) no longer exist. (Arendt, 1968: 474).

A key challenge to Arendt’s analysis is shared with all such work on the frontier between political theory and intellectual history, namely its degree of empirical truthfulness and the precise accuracy of its causal explanations (Gleason, 1995). Establishing such causal connections requires the extensive use of detailed historical evidence, as well as the colligation of coexisting ideas upon which Arendt relied. So, the account is subject to the usual historiographical and logical criticisms concerning the possible gap between the causation of events and the correlation of trends.

For all of the considerable attention that The Origins of Totalitarianism attracted in 1951, it was in 1963 that Arendt was to produce one of the most controversial works ever written by a political philosopher. Eichmann in Jerusalem: A Report on the Banality of Evil did not merely generate much discussion; it produced an intellectual shock wave heard around the world that still reverberates:

Hannah Arendt’s Eichmann in Jerusalem was published fifty years ago….It’s hard to think of another work capable of setting off ferocious polemics a half century after its publication. (Lilla, 2013).

Arendt here developed and expanded her general conclusions on the Holocaust and fascist bureaucracy from a series of articles that she wrote on the Eichmann trial for The New Yorker.

She claimed that for all of his extreme evil, Eichmann was not a mysterious monster, neither in his overall demeanour nor in his political and moral psychology. His evil was as much a matter of consequences as of intent, and in fact his intentions emerged as mixed, during the trial before the Israeli court. Arendt did not claim, in her thesis of “the banality of evil” that Eichmann was entirely neutral in his managing of the Nazi’s final solution, as has been maintained. Rather, she saw him as a distinctly modern product of a totalitarian bureaucracy who at times was eager to implement Hitler’s genocide, but who also showed real tendencies towards narrow instrumental rationality, clichéd thought and speaking patterns, and superficial amorality. She was thus struck by his at times entirely average bearing and thought patterns throughout the trial, for all of the enormous evil that he perpetrated.

Furthermore, Arendt claimed that the Eichmann case confirmed her view that totalitarianism represents a gross perversion of fundamental civilised and ethical values in favour of mass bureaucracy, propaganda and thoughtlessness. Both perpetrators and victims of the Holocaust were thus corrupted through a process involving the malevolence and instrumental efficiency of the Nazis, as well as the activities of a collaborating minority in the ghetto police and Jewish Councils. This last point was to provoke particular discomfort and sheer hostility, giving Arendt a virtual pariah status, although later Holocaust historiography has placed the general problem of collaboration in a more balanced context.

For Arendt, Eichmann was as much a product of the worst possible tendencies of state bureaucracy as a creator of them. This bureaucratic context in no way exonerated him, as she was careful to indicate; she held his execution in 1962 to be justified, even though she thought that there was a strong case in international law for an international tribunal for the case, rather than the Israeli court. However, the bureaucratic framework of Eichmann’s crimes required a re-examination of what she held to be a misleading diabolical conception of evil. That there is a tension between this account and the notion of radical evil developed in The Origins of Totalitarianism seems clear. However, both works share the important common denominator of an indictment of totalitarian bureaucracies that render the unthinkable not just possible, but probable and even banal. In a very real sense, this is a more disturbing thesis than Arendt’s earlier conception of evil as radical or in no small part beyond rational explanation. If Arendt was right overall, totalitarianism is a constant threat in modern mass societies, and no complacency on the matter can be justified.

d. Erich Fromm on Escaping from Freedom: A Psychoanalytical Approach

Among the various attempts to apply psychoanalysis to the question of totalitarianism, Erich Fromm’s Escape from Freedom is conspicuous for its sustained argumentation and conceptual scope. Fromm’s thesis that there exists an “authoritarian character” was subsequently developed through empirical case studies by Theodor W. Adorno and his co-authors in their work, The Authoritarian Personality.

Fromm was a philosophically inclined sociologist, who drew from both the Freudian and Marxist traditions in elaborating an explanation of diverse social phenomena. This is apparent in his view that there exists what might termed a self-reinforcing causal mechanism between social processes and ideology, in which psycho-social factors are reinforced by belief systems, and vice versa.

Central to Fromm’s analysis is the notion that totalitarianism stems from several root causes linked to the full emergence of modern individualism in the aftermath of the Reformation. Medieval social psychology was strongly transcendental in its emphasis of the secondary character of secular authority under God, and thus it inhibited the development of the sense of loneliness and isolation that characterised Western history from about the sixteenth century onwards.

For Fromm, Protestantism stimulated the development of individualism in its stress on individual success and good works, dutiful submission to God, thrift, and a significant sphere for secular authority. A self-reinforcing causal mechanism became increasingly apparent, especially among the middle classes of modern capitalist society, as the new form of Christianity helped to create the modern individual, and was in turn strengthened by the resultant socio-economic psychology of modern European society.

However, there can be no turning back the clock according to Fromm. Rather, modern humanity must strive to encourage healthy life-affirming values and the expression of human freedom. This is best done by recognising, as a society, the values of love, spontaneity, and secure personal development.

Fromm proposes that the anxiety in isolated individuals, produced by the great burden to succeed demonstrably and without secured grace in the eyes of God, led to severe social and psycho-pathologies. In particular, collectivist ideologies, including totalitarianism, emerged to satisfy the modern individual’s need for a sense of a higher purpose or calling:

It seems that nothing is more difficult for the average man to bear than the feeling of not being identified with a larger group….The fear of isolation and the relative weakness of moral principles help any party to win the loyalty of a large sector of the population once that party has captured the power of the state. (Fromm, 1969: 234).

A chilling picture thus emerges of an inherently alienated and insecure modern society that generates mass social movements of conformity. For Fromm, this was especially true of the German lower middle class, which he held to be strongly influenced by modern individualistic ideologies. He furthermore held that this class was the most alienated class in Germany, and thereby prone to a compensatory destructiveness, and that it was strongly characterised in Weimar Germany by a sense of having lost its legitimate class status. Thus the rise of Nazism had both important psycho-social and class factors, in his view.

Fromm analyses various “mechanisms of escape” by which the alienated seek relief from the burden of individual autonomy. Prime strategies, linked to totalitarianism’s appeal, are unthinking submission to the leader, and mindless conformity. The latter trend he saw not just in totalitarian society, but in capitalist democracies as well, and as requiring concerted social activism.

Both sadism and masochism are seen by Fromm as attempts to overcome feelings of individual powerlessness and meaninglessness. In politics, the authoritarian character is characterized by a slavish and nihilistic submission to authority, and a desire to have it over others. This character type, for Fromm, is the one most easily seduced by fascism.

If Fromm was correct in this, then the root causes of totalitarianism are both internal or psychological and external, in the form of trends in class relations and ideological evolution. The threat therefore remains nascent even in seemingly highly democratic modern societies, although Fromm did not advocate a relativism that would blur the lines between imperfect democracies and dictatorships.

Fromm, like Taylor, holds that positive notions of freedom can be of constructive value in counteracting political and social distortions and pathologies. In particular, a social democratic society that provides the individual with adequate resources and a sense of autonomous personal development can do much, he held, to reduce the appeal of totalitarian ideologies and to promote mental health and social ethics:

We must replace manipulation of men by active and intelligent cooperation, and expand the principle of government of the people, by the people, for the people to the economic sphere. (Fromm, 1969: 300).

Fromm’s analysis focussed considerably more on fascism than on communism. Its political diagnosis of Nazism, in particular, has been faulted even by sympathetic critics on several counts:

Fromm did not…treat the intensity of Hitler’s anti-Semitism, choosing instead to locate the Jew with the communist and the Frenchman as examples of Hitler’s purportedly “lesser” groups. Nor did Fromm point to the discredited Social Darwinist premises behind the Nazi quest for Aryan purity…. His hypothesis about the lower middle class has not held up. The Nazis gained votes from all classes. (Friedman, 2013: 113).

In his later work, Fromm extended his classic work on human aggression and destructiveness, providing psycho-biographies of totalitarian leaders such as Hitler, Himmler, and Stalin.

3. Later Work

a. Judith Shklar’s Liberalism of Fear

Throughout her work, the American political theorist Judith Shklar stressed the importance of seeing liberalism not as a utopian or perfectionistic ideal, but rather as a bulwark against tyranny and cruelty. In effect, she claimed that liberalism ought to be defined more by its opposition to oppression and nastiness than by anything else.

Shklar traces the roots of liberalism to the struggle for religious toleration in Reformation and Baroque Europe. In her model, a progressive consensus emerged in Western thought, holding that cruelty is supremely wicked. Early figures in this development include Montaigne and Montesquieu, whom Shklar contrasted with Machiavelli on this question.

This commitment to “put cruelty first” contributed greatly to the development of liberalism’s abhorrence of dictatorships of all kinds, including those of a modern totalitarian character. This implies an affirmation of memory over hope, and of sensitivity to the horrors of oppression over utopian aspiration. Not merely property rights, cultural pluralism, and the rule of law, but anti-tyranny first and foremost define the modern liberal perspective. If liberalism is rare historically and globally, this has more to do with the widespread character of cruel delusion than with any intrinsic defect on its part. For Shklar, we ought to remember at all costs the disastrous consequences of not putting cruelty first:

We must…be suspicious of ideologies of solidarity, precisely because they are so attractive to those who find liberalism emotionally unsatisfying, and who have gone on in our century to create oppressive and cruel regimes of unparalleled horror. (Shklar, 1998: 18).

Shklar’s negative liberalism has been criticised by Michael Walzer as setting reasonable anti-totalitarian boundaries for democratic action, while not recognising the importance of moving beyond them in the interest of social progress:

We always have to be afraid of political power; that is the central liberal insight. But this is an insight into a central experience that wasn’t discovered, only theorised by liberal writers. Nor does this fear by itself make for an adequate theory of political power. We must address the uses of power as well as its dangers. And since it has many uses, we must choose among them, designing policies, like Shklar’s guaranteed employment, that enhance and strengthen what we most value in own way of life. Then we try to enforce those policies, carefully if we are wise, remembering the last time we were fearful, and acting within the limits of liberal negativity. (Walzer, 1996: 24).

If this is correct, then the strong anti-totalitarianism of the liberalism of fear should be seen as setting boundaries against tyranny, rather than final limits to progressive social policy. Positive liberty is thereby affirmed, within strong democratic boundaries.

b. Avishai Margalit on the Decent Society and Totalitarianism

In reaction to the strong emphasis upon theories of justice in late twentieth century political thought, Avishai Margalit presented his case for the “decent society.” Such a society is, first and foremost, one that does not humiliate people. This means not treating human beings as less than human, as mere machines, animals, or inanimate objects. For Margalit, even if a society is just institutionally and procedurally, it may nonetheless denigrate its citizens and subjects in diverse institutional ways, thereby rendering it formally civilized but indecent. Without denying the value of social justice and the rule of law, Margalit has claimed that philosophy and political theory long neglected decency, which is every bit as important as justice. In so doing, they could not do justice to one of the main forms of oppression: institutional and state contempt for individuals.

In The Decent Society, Margalit contrasts totalitarian and gossip societies. Both these types of society are, for Margalit, indecent in not respecting individuals and their own legitimate social space. Gossip societies allow for a considerable range of imperfection, but lack decency in their absence of respect for privacy, and their non-institutional or cultural humiliation of alleged non-conformists.

In their radical perfectionism, totalitarian societies have no respect for individual privacy, and they systematically and institutionally obliterate communal and family structure between the individual and the state. Such societies’ regimes do everything within their considerable power to humiliate their subjects so as ultimately to perfect them, by recognising no legitimate private space, and by gathering sensitive information with which to blackmail and control them. They are thus agents of ultimate indecency, for Margalit.

Friendship among anti-totalitarian dissidents is thus especially valuable and intense, because of the potentially life and death solidarity that is generated by opposition to supreme state and bureaucratic indecency. The violation of such friendships by forcing dissidents to reveal sensitive information about others to the state is, for Margalit, one of the worst aspects of totalitarianism:

Totalitarian societies have proved to be a prescription for and guarantor of brave friendship, since friendships in regimes of this sort are conspiracies of humanity against the inhumanity of the regime. (Margalit, 1996: 210).

Margalit’s analysis provoked some re-examination of political and social philosophy’s focus on justice. In particular, the general core question of the balance to be struck between decency and justice raises fundamental questions about value priority:

…one might take the view that the best way for a society to strive to become decent is by promoting justice. By treating people in accordance with justice, society denies them one sound reason to feel rejected from humanity, however much they may actually feel that way….the decent and the just society may be too closely intertwined for us to be able to say that one or other has clear priority as an ideal. (Patten, 2001: 231).

Patten’s question reminds us of the extent to which justice and rights have a fundamental role in social and political values. It should be clear that Margalit in no way wishes to deny the value of justice. However, one may recall here Arendt’s thesis to the effect that totalitarianism arose in part not only because of an indecent Social Darwinism, but due to the repudiation of universal human rights. This may well be a strong challenge to attempts to reduce the firm priority of justice in political life.

4. References and Further Reading

Adorno, Theodor W., Frenkel-Brunswik, Else, Levinson, Daniel J., and Sanford, R. Nevitt. The Authoritarian Personality. Harper & Brothers, New York, 1950.
Arendt, Hannah. Eichmann in Jerusalem: A Report of the Banality of Evil. Penguin, New York, 2006.
Arendt, Hannah. The Origins of Totalitarianism. Harvest Books, Harcourt Brace Janovitch, San Diego, New York and London, 1968.
Arendt, Hannah. Between Past and Future: Six Exercises in Political Thought. Meridian Books, the World Publishing Company, Cleveland and New York, 1963. (Contains “What is Authority?”)
Berlin, Isaiah. The Crooked Timber of Humanity: Chapters in the History of Ideas. Edited by Henry Hardy. Pimlico, London, 2003a. (Contains “The Pursuit of the Ideal,” and “The Decline of Utopian Ideals in the West.”)
Berlin, Isaiah. Freedom and its Betrayal: Six Enemies of Human Liberty. Hardy, Henry (editor). Pimlico, London, 2003b.
Berlin, Isaiah. Liberty. Hardy, Henry (editor). Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York, 2002. (Contains several key essays in the section “Five Essays on Liberty.”)
Berlin, Isaiah. The Sense of Reality. Hardy, Henry (editor). Chatto and Windus, London, 1996. (Contains important essays such as “”The Sense of Reality,” “Political Judgement,” and “Philosophy and Government Repression.”)
Bossuet, Jacques. Politics Drawn from the Very Words of Holy Scripture. Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1999.
Cotter, Matthew J. (editor). Sidney Hook Reconsidered. Prometheus Books, Amherst, NY, 2004.
Dewey, John. The Political Writings. Morris, Deborah and Shapiro, Ian (editors). Hackett, Indianapolis and Cambridge, 1993. (Contains “I Believe”)
Friedman, Lawrence J. The Lives of Erich Fromm: Love’s Prophet. Columbia University Press, New York, 2013.
Friedrich, Carl J. and Brzezinski, Zbigniew K. Totalitarian Dictatorship and Autocracy. Harvard University Press, Cambridge, 1956.
Fromm, Erich. The Anatomy of Human Destructiveness. Holt, Rinehart and Winston, New York, 1973.
Fromm, Erich. Escape from Freedom (Fear of Freedom in the UK). Avon Books, New York, 1969.
Fromm, Erich. Man for Himself. Fawcett Premier, Greenwich, Connecticut, 1967.
Gentile, Giovanni. Origins and Doctrine of Fascism with Selections from Other Works. Edited by A. James Gregor. Transaction Publishers, Edison, NJ, 2003.
Gleason, Abbott. Totalitarianism: The Inner History of the Cold War. Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York, 1995.
Hobbes, Thomas. Leviathan. Wordsworth Editions, Hertfordshire, 2014.
Hoffmann, Stanley (editor). Political Thought and Political Thinkers. University of Chicago Press, Chicago and London, 1998.
Hook, Sidney. Heresy, Yes—Conspiracy, No. Greenwood Press, Publishers, Westport, Connecticut, 1953.
Hook Sidney. “Heresy, Yes—But Conspiracy, No.” New York Times Magazine, July 9, 1950. Available online through Dissent Archives.
Kołakowski, Leszek. Modernity on Endless Trial. University of Chicago Press, Chicago, 1990.
Konvitz, Milton R. and Kennedy, Gail (editors). The American Pragmatists. Meridian Books, UK, 1960.
Lenin, Vladimir. The State and Revolution. Penguin Books, Middlesex, 2009.
Lilla, Mark. “Arendt and Eichmann: The New Truth.” New York Review of Books, November 21, 2013. Online version.
Litwack, Eric B. “Erratum to: Epistemic Arguments against Dictatorships.” Human Affairs 21, 2011, pp. 226-235,.
Macpherson, C. B. “Review of The Origins of Totalitarian Democracy.” Past and Present, Number 2, November 1952, pp. 55-57.
Patten, Alan. “Review of The Decent Society.” Mind, Volume 110, Number 437, January 2001, pp. 229-232.
Plato. Republic. Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1993.
Popper, Karl. The Open Society and its Enemies. Routledge Classics, Oxford, 2011.
Popper, Karl. The Poverty of Historicism. Routledge, London, 1960.
Putnam, Hilary. Renewing Philosophy. Harvard University Press, Cambridge and London, 1992.
Schmitt, Carl. Dictatorship. Polity Press, Cambridge, 2013.
Schmitt, Carl. The Concept of the Political. University of Chicago Press, Chicago, 2007.
Shklar, Judith N. “The Liberalism of Fear,” in Political Thought and Political Thinkers. Hoffman, Stanley (editor). University of Chicago Press, Chicago and London, 1998.
Shklar, Judith N. “Putting Cruelty First.” Daedalus Volume 111, Number 3, Summer, 1982, pp. 17-27.
Talisse, Robert B. “Politics without Dogmas: Hook’s Basic Ideals.” In Cotter 2004, pp. 117-128.
Talmon, J. L. The Origins of Totalitarian Democracy. Penguin Books, Harmondsworth, UK and New York, 1986.
Taylor, Charles. Philosophy and the Human Sciences. Philosophical Papers 2. Cambridge University Press, Cambridge and New York, 1985. (Contains “What’s Wrong with Negative Liberty?”)
Walzer, Michael. “On Negative Politics.” Yack, Bernard (editor) (1996), pp. 17-24.
Westbrook, Robert B. Democratic Hope: Pragmatism and the Politics of Truth. Cornell University Press, Ithaca and London, 2005.
Yack, Bernard (editor). Liberalism without Illusions: Essays on Liberal Theory and the Political Vision of Judith N. Shklar. University of Chicago Press, Chicago and London, 1996.

Author Information

Eric B. Litwack
Email: e_litwack@bisc.queensu.ac.uk
Queen’s University and Syracuse University in London
United Kingdom

Thomas Reid: Philosophy of Mind

This article focuses on the philosophy of mind of Thomas Reid (1710-1796), as presented in An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense (1764) and Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man (1785). Reid’s action theory and his views on what makes humans morally worthy agents, although connected to philosophy of mind, are not explored here.

Reid is best known as the father of common sense philosophy. He contends that going back to the principles of common sense will help deal with the problems engendered by the so-called “skeptical views” of his predecessors: Descartes, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. He argues that “the way of ideas” generates undue uncertainty in the theory of knowledge. If the only things that can be known directly and immediately are the contents of one’s mind, there can be no certainty in the knowledge geared toward the external world. Reid believes this goes against the common-sense view that humans do acquire certain knowledge through empirical observation of the external world, and are therefore not confined to know only the contents of their minds.

In philosophy of mind, Reid is most celebrated today for the arguments he gave in support of the position known as direct realism, which, at its most basic, states that the primary objects of sense perception are physical objects, not ideas in human minds. However, Reid’s philosophy of mind neither begins nor ends with perception. In addition to arguing for direct realism and, consequently, against “the way of ideas,” he undertook the task of establishing the equal status of the faculties of the mind, and of explaining the relationships that exist among them. He is a worthy successor of Locke, in that he believes that the mind is to be characterized in terms of a faculty psychology. He is a worthy successor of Newton, in that he believes that the scientific method is the right way of investigating the nature of mind. Reid characterized the scientific method mainly by trial and error, and by setting up experiments and drawing general conclusions from them.

One of the starting points of Reid’s philosophy of mind is a traditional distinction between the “powers of the understanding” and the “powers of the will.” Reid believes this distinction is not entirely correct because the mind is active whenever the powers of the understanding are exercised, and a certain degree of understanding is needed for any act of will. However, he uses it to classify the faculties of the mind into intellectual, on the one hand, and active, on the other. The distinction is used in the titles of his two mature published works: Essays on the Intellectual Power of Man (1785) and Essays on the Active Powers of Man (1788), which he envisioned as two sides of the same coin. Reid thought that any theory of the mind should comprise an investigation into both types of mental operations.

Sensation
Perception
1. Original Perception
2. Acquired Perception
Memory
1. General Considerations on Memory
2. Memory and Personal Identity
Intellectual Powers (Proper)
1. Conception
  1. Bare Conception
  2. Imagination
2. Judgment and Reasoning
Taste
1. Why This Faculty Is Called “Internal Taste”
2. An Objectivist Account of Beauty
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Sensation

Reid argues that sensation is an original and simple operation of the mind, which for him means not only that certain beings (namely sentient ones) are born with an ability to sense, but also that this operation of the mind cannot be logically defined. All natural operations of the mind are simple and, in some sense, primitive, so that no reductive definition can be offered. This does not mean, however, that one cannot pay attention to the specific role played by this operation. In doing so, one will discover its most important features.

Although careful introspective observation will reveal that sensations do not usually occur on their own, but are almost always accompanied by perceptions, Reid is pointing out that a clear-cut distinction between sensation and perception exists and should be accounted for. This distinction has to do primarily with the specific roles sensations and perceptions play in the knowledge of the external world. Sensations are of limited use, in this sense; they only give information of what goes on in the sentient being. Perceptions, on the other hand, contribute to basic repository knowledge. In sensing a smell or tasting a taste, for instance, a sentient being will take notice of how its mind is affected, but, as Reid points out, such sensations bear no resemblance to any of the qualities of the external objects that cause these sensations to occur in the sentient being. Here Reid differs from his predecessors: according to John Locke, for instance, at least some sensations (those derived from the primary qualities of objects) do resemble the external objects which occasion the formation of such simple ideas in sentient beings such as humans (Locke, Essay II. viii. 15). To make the distinction with perception more vivid, Reid discusses an example: in seeing a flower or touching a sugar cube—which involves perceiving and having contentful thoughts about these objects, as is elaborated in the next section—humans gain knowledge about what these external objects really are. There still is no resemblance thesis advanced, to be sure; the mind is simply projected outside itself and, in doing so, it objectifies the things in its environment. In this, Reid is very forward-thinking: he is the first philosopher to draw a distinction between sensation and perception, which is extensively employed in contemporary philosophy of mind and psychology (as J. J. Gibson rightfully noticed).

This distinction between sensation and perception rests primarily on a peculiarity of the faculty of sensation: Reid believes that this is the only operation of the mind that “hath no object distinct from the act itself” (EIP I. 1, 36). He acknowledges the fact that human language is misleading in this respect: for instance, for both sensation and perception, people use “the same mode of expression” (IHM 6.20, 167). This mode of expression involves an active verb and an object: one can say both that “I feel a pain” and that “I see a tree” (IHM 6.20, 167). But, Reid contends, in the former case the object itself is grammatical only, and not also real, whereas in the latter the object is a real thing, allegedly existing outside the perceiver’s mind.

It is less clear what Reid means when he says that the object is not real, but grammatical only, in the case of the construction expressing a sensation that one may feel. There are two ways of interpreting this claim, and this ambiguity tracks two distinct positions in the secondary literature on Reid. On the one hand, sensations, for Reid, can be understood to not have objects at all: as such, this mental operation is distinct from all others. If we understand sensation to have no object, to be about nothing, it cannot ever be wrong. This would mark sensation as a very special faculty among the faculties of the human mind; perception or memory are not like this: someone can misperceive a tree just as well as he can misremember having seen a tree. But a person can never be mistaken about a feeling that particular person has: whenever someone has a headache, that ache is real and it is that person’s and it is exactly as that person is feeling it. On the other hand, that passage has been read as saying that sensations take themselves as objects; Reid, in this interpretation, would subscribe to a reflexive view of sensations. Just like perceptions and memories, sensations are constituted by two other ingredients: a conception of the object, and a belief that the object exists, except, in the case of sensation, this object is the sensation itself, not an external object like trees, frogs, or human beings.

A consequence of understanding Reid as saying that sensations do not have any kind of objects is to think that he is a precursor of “adverbial” theories of sensation. In this account, a sentient being is not said to have a sensation of a red object, but to sense in a certain way whenever stimulated in the right manner. Sensations inform the sentient being of various ways of feeling: there is a particular way of feeling redly, as opposed to a particular way of feeling yellowly, and there is yet another way of feeling headachely (see also Sense-Data). Understanding that sensations provide us with a qualitative feel and making sense of what exactly this means has become very important in early 21^st century discussions on the nature of mind and consciousness. According to some authors, such as David Chalmers, Frank Jackson, Joseph Levine, and Thomas Nagel, qualia offer sufficient proof that a complete reduction of all mental processes to purely physical processes (as described by a physicalist interpretation of brain processes) is impossible (for more, see Qualia). So, understanding Reid’s position in this manner will place him squarely in the same tradition as one of the most important debates in contemporary philosophy of mind.

The last attribute of sensations worth mentioning is their role as signs of external objects. Usually, sensations pass unnoticed (unless the sentient being carefully attends to them) to other things that they signify. This feature of sensations allows Reid to argue that they are never to be associated to Lockean ideas (Locke, Essay II. viii. 8): they are not the objects of perception, and, moreover, they are not mental intermediaries between the mind and the world. Perception of external objects turns out to be immediate, in Reid’s view (Reid on sensations as signs: IHM 2. 10, 43; IHM 4. 1, 49; IHM 6. 21, 177). To properly understand the role of sensations as signs of external objects, according to Reid, an analysis of perception should be given, a task undertaken in the next section.

2. Perception

Perception is the main faculty that has the role to give beings endowed with this faculty brute knowledge about the external world: the knowledge is brute because no reasoning enters perception; and the result is knowledge, even though sometimes when the perceiver believes that something is being perceived, something is actually being either perceptually illusioned or hallucinated. However, even when a perceptual state results in a false outcome, the state itself should be characterized as perception (for more on how and why perception can be non-veridical, see EIP II. 22, 241–252). So, this is how sensations, as signs of external things, work to connect minds with external things. Reid argues that:

[A] requisite to our knowing things by signs is, that the appearance of the sign to the mind, be followed by the conception and belief of the thing signified. Without this the sign is not understood or interpreted; and therefore is no sign to us. […] Now, there are three ways in which the mind passes from the appearance of a natural sign to the conception and belief of the thing signified; by original principles of our constitution, by custom, and by reasoning. (IHM 6. 21, 177)

This passage is important in several respects: (i) it gives Reid’s “official” characterization of perception, and (ii) it lays the foundation for an important distinction at the level of perception. These two aspects are discussed in turn.

First, Reid argues that “the appearance of the sign” is followed by a conception and belief of the thing signified. When Reid gives his official characterization of perception he states that this faculty involves several others: the occurrence of a sensation suggests a conception and a belief of the existence of the thing perceived. Moreover, this existential belief is immediate, and not the product of reasoning (EIP II. 6, 96). If it were the product of reasoning, “the greatest part of men would be destitute of [the information had of external objects]; for the greater part of men hardly ever learn to reason; and in infancy and childhood no man can reason” (EIP II. 6, 101). Perception, therefore, must be able to occur independently from any act of reasoning.

The second feature of perception that the passage quoted above refers to is the distinction Reid draws between original perception and acquired perception: in the case of original perception, a natural sign (that is, a sensation) suggests a conception and a belief “by original principles of our constitution.” In the case of acquired perception, by contrast, the natural sign in question suggests a conception and a belief “by custom,” which most probably means “habit” and/or “experience.” Let us take a closer look at this distinction by pinning down some of the essential features of original perception, and by emphasizing some of the points of departures from this model, in the case of acquired perception.

a. Original Perception

According to Reid (IHM 6. 20, 171 and EIP II. 21), only two of the senses give beings endowed with them original perceptions, namely those of touch and sight. The sense of sight is somewhat problematic in this respect, though, since vision does not provide creatures endowed with it with original visual perceptions of some things, for instance depth, but only with acquired ones. In original tactile perception, the sensation had of the so-called “primary qualities of bodies” immediately suggests a conception and belief of the existence of these qualities, and of substances in which such qualities inhere. In original visual perception, the sensations of colors suggest conceptions and beliefs of the existence of the so-called “secondary quality” of color as existing outside of minds, in an external object. The perception of visible figure is also supposed to be original, according to Reid and, according to the standard interpretation of Reid, it is not accompanied by any type of visual sensation whatsoever. Why does Reid think that only two of the senses—touch and vision—can give beings that have them original perceptions? Why cannot smell, taste, and hearing provide such beings with original perceptions? Can this have anything to do with the distinction between primary and secondary qualities of objects? This is a good place to offer some details on Reid’s view of the distinction between primary and secondary qualities of objects. As previously mentioned, Reid thinks that Locke was wrong to believe that there is some resemblance between primary qualities of objects and the ideas or sensations sentient beings have of them. However, Reid himself draws a distinction between these two types of properties of objects:

There appears to be a real foundation for the distinction, and it is this: That our senses give us a direct and distinct notion of the primary qualities, and inform us what they are in themselves: But of the secondary qualities, our senses give us only a relative and obscure notion. They inform us only, that they are qualities that affect us in a certain manner, that is, produce in us a certain sensation; but as to what they are in themselves, our senses leave us in the dark. ([emphasis added]; EIP II. 17, 201)

Reid argues that knowledge of primary qualities—like squareness, or hardness, or motion—is direct: it captures everything there is to know about such a quality. Squareness, hardness, motion, and all the other mathematical qualities of bodies are known intrinsically. The conception human beings have of secondary qualities, like color, for instance, is not like this; hence it does not constitute knowledge. All there is to know about a secondary quality is that sentient beings are constituted in such a way that whenever a normal being is in contact with the color red, under normal conditions, that being gets a sensation, which is different in what it feels like to that being from the sensation that same being gets whenever it is stimulated with the color yellow, under normal conditions. Other examples of primary qualities of bodies include shape, size, and solidity. Besides color, other examples of secondary qualities are heat, cold, smell, and taste..

This distinction is important for understanding Reid’s view of original perception, since one way of drawing this distinction is by reference to what kinds of things can be originally perceived, as opposed to what kinds of things can be perceived only in an acquired manner. It might seem that the distinction between original and acquired perception is essentially linked with the more traditional one between primary and secondary qualities of bodies. This is indeed what several scholars have argued, citing as main evidence for this interpretation the fact that human beings have direct conceptions only of primary qualities. Based on this type of conception, human beings gain knowledge only of primary qualities and, if perception is supposed to give perceivers knowledge, as Reid thinks, it seems clear that perceivers can perceive only primary qualities of bodies, since perceivers do not gain any knowledge, by their senses, of secondary qualities. This argument seems correct, but it has a severe uphill battle because Reid specifically and consistently places color, a secondary quality, on the list of things that can be originally perceived (IHM 6. 20 p. 171; EIP II. 21, p. 236). So, if we are to listen to Reid, the distinction between primary and secondary qualities, on the one hand, and the distinction between original and acquired perception, on the other, do not carve the world in the same way. The distinction between original and acquired perception, therefore, must be clarified in a different way.

b. Acquired Perception

Acquired perception is distinguished from original perception primarily by the role of learning and experience. There is no need for any type of experience, according to Reid, for human beings to be able to perceive the primary qualities of bodies and the bodies themselves by touching them, for instance. However, one must learn to associate a certain sign that conjures up an original perception or a sensation only, with a certain external object. There is a controversy in the literature concerning what exactly this learning involves: according to some authors (for example, Van Cleve (2004)), it initially involves inference or reasoning, thus excluding anything that we acquire in this way from the list of things that we actually perceive, since perception, for Reid is a faculty that does not rest on the perceiver’s reasoning powers, as indicated in the previous section (EIP II. 6, 101). According to other authors (such as Copenhaver (2010)), however, acquired perception never involves any type of reasoning. Rather, Reid intended acquired perception to be understood as a distinctively perceptual ability: with the passage of time, normal perceivers acquire more perceptual sensitivity to properties not represented in original perception. Here is Reid explaining how this happens in the case of perception of depth and three-dimensional figure by sight:

It is experience that teaches me that the variation of colour is an effect of spherical convexity […]. But so rapid is the progress of the thought, from the effect to the cause, that we attend only to the last, and can hardly be persuaded that we do not immediately see the three dimensions of the sphere. (EIP II.21, 236)

The fact that this type of ability is called “acquired” should not suggest that it is less natural than the original variety. Beings endowed with the ability to develop acquired perception do not develop this ability consciously or only because they decide to acquire certain perceptions. Here is what Reid says concerning this:

In acquired perception, the signs are either sensations, or things which we perceive by means of sensations. The connection between the sign and the thing signified, is established by nature: and we discover this connection by experience; but not without the aid of our original perceptions, or of those which we have already acquired. After this connection is discovered, the sign, in like manner as in original perception, always suggests the thing signified, and creates the belief of it. (IHM 6. 24, 191)

Acquired perception thus builds upon the original abilities of sensing and originally perceiving things in nature that human beings have. In acquired perception, in contrast to original perception, the conventional associations between signs and things signified are introduced by a combination between nature and experience. In original perception, these conventions are the result of nature alone: this is the way humans are constituted. Reid believes that acquired perceptions are far more numerous than original perceptions (EIP XXI. 21, 235).

3. Memory

a. General Considerations on Memory

Memory, for Reid, is the perfect counterpart to perception: it is an original faculty of minds, which is meant to give beings endowed with it immediate access to the past. He argues that it is a first principle of common sense “[t]hat those things did really happen which I distinctly remember” ([emphasis added]; EIP VI. 5, p. 474) and that the knowledge that memory gives is “immediate knowledge of things past” (EIP II. 1, p. 253). No mental entities, such as ideas, mediate a being’s access to the external world in memory, just like no such entities mediate such a being’s access to the world in perception. There are three things involved in perception, and, similarly, there are three things involved in memory: a mind, a faculty, and an external object, which the mind gains knowledge of via the faculty in question. For Reid, “[m]emory implies a conception and belief of past duration” (EIP III. 1, p. 254). This formulation mirrors the one that he gave to further explain how perception operates, although both in the case of memory and of perception, these explanations are not definitions, since both these faculties are simple, and hence cannot be reductively defined by analyzing their components. The external object, in the case of perception, is (allegedly) presently existing; the external object, in the case of memory, was (allegedly) existing in the past of the mind having the memory in question. Beings endowed with perception can be said to mis-perceive things—which are either different than they appear to be or do not exist altogether; and beings endowed with memory can be said to mis-remember things—which were either different than they appeared to such beings or did not exist altogether. To present his own views on memory, Reid starts by first criticizing his precursors, primarily Locke and Hume, for operating with a so-called “store-house” model of memory. Contrary to what he takes Locke and Hume to be saying, memory is not a repository for ideas, which can be revived, whenever the person who had those ideas needs them again (for example, Locke, Essay II.xx.2). The main problem here, according to Reid, is that if an idea could indeed be revived in this way, that idea would be perceived again, and not actually remembered. This is because, as Reid understands them, Locke and Hume argue that ideas are the immediate objects of perception. So, whenever an idea is present to the mind—whether for the first time or when it is revived—the mind should be said to perceive it. What does memory contribute here, Reid asks? Even though Reid is not the most charitable interpreter of Locke or of Hume, some of the criticisms he raises are cogent. There is a threat of circularity in the account of memory offered by both Locke and Hume, as Reid understands them. Both Locke and Hume’s accounts of memory seem to presuppose memory, rather than explain it: the ability to understand that a certain idea that is now present to the mind is exactly the same, qualitatively, and not numerically (since both Locke and Hume believe that ideas are fleeting), as an idea that was present to the mind at a previous moment of time, needs memory. The problem is that no idea contains any information, qualitative or representational, that could be used to identify that idea as being about the past.

So, what is Reid’s positive account of memory? Here is what he says at the beginning of the Essay on memory:

Things remembered must be things formerly perceived or known. I remember the transit of Venus over the sun in the year 1769. I must therefore have perceived it at the time it happened, otherwise I could not now remember it. Our first acquaintance with any object of thought cannot be by remembrance. Memory can only produce continuance or renewal of a former acquaintance with the thing remembered. (EIP III. 1, p. 253-55)

This suggests that Reid is operating with a precursor of a distinction used in the psychological literature of the twentieth century, as advanced primarily by Tulving (1983). According to Tulving (1983) there are two main types of long-term memory: procedural—whereby one remembers how to perform certain actions (for instance, one remembers how to ride a bike or how to bake a cake), and declarative. This latter type is itself divided into episodic memory—whereby one remembers an experience that one underwent or an event one witnessed (for example, somebody remembers running in her first 5K race); and semantic memory—whereby one remembers that so-and-so is the case, where the fact remembered may be something that happened before one’s time (such as when one remembers that Napoleon was defeated at Waterloo). Semantic memory is further distinguished from the episodic kind by the so-called “previous awareness condition” on episodic memory, which requires for someone to have been there in a capacity of witness or agent of an event, for that event to be episodically remembered. Reid thinks that something like the previous awareness condition on episodic memory must be satisfied in cases like the one quoted above: for someone to remember something, that person must have perceived that thing at an earlier moment of time.

There is a debate among Reid scholars concerning this very issue: did Reid think that all memory should be understood as episodic, or did he have room in his theory for semantic memory as well? Some authors believe that, for Reid, all memory is episodic (for instance, Van Woudenberg (1999)); others believe that Reid was concerned with both semantic and episodic memory (such as Copenhaver (2009)). The consensus in the literature is, however, that Reid had nothing very interesting to say about procedural memory. This is important since it shows Reid to be very forward-thinking in his treatment of memory: he believes that episodic memory is fundamental for a being’s immediate knowledge of its past.

So, how does memory connect a being endowed with such a faculty with past events? According to Reid, memory does not offer a being endowed with this faculty a present connection with an event experienced in the past. The access to past events is not by re-acquaintance, as Locke or Hume would say. The past acquaintance of the event itself is preserved through the conception and belief deployed in a memorial experience. This is because, according to Reid, apprehension, when employed by another faculty, such as perception and consciousness, is strictly related to the present moment:

It is by memory that we have an immediate knowledge of things past: The senses give us information of things only as they exist in the present moment; and this information, if it were not preserved by memory, would vanish instantly, and leave us as ignorant as if it had never been. (EIP III. 1, p. 253)

b. Memory and Personal Identity

Reid is famous for his criticism of Locke’s theory of personal identity. The success of this criticism depends on the explanation of the relationship that perception and consciousness, on the one hand, and memory, on the other, have with time. Perception and consciousness give a being endowed with such faculties immediate knowledge of presently existing things: of how the external world is, and of how the mental operations of the minds of such beings succeed one another, respectively. Memory, on the other hand, gives beings endowed with this faculty immediate knowledge of things past; and these things can be, in turn, external or internal. Someone can remember, for instance, having a certain nauseating sensation upon encountering some rotten food. That person will not only remember the state of the food, in this case, but also his having a certain unpleasant sensation.

Reid finds Locke’s theory of personal identity lacking on two counts: (i) first, Locke suggests that consciousness can extend to the past (Essay II.xxvii.9); (ii) second, Reid thinks that Locke is claiming that personal identity consists in memory—sometimes this theory of personal identity is called “the memory theory of personal identity.” The two issues are related, and the first one might very well be terminological: what Locke meant by “consciousness,” in this context, Reid means by “memory”:

Mr Locke attributes to consciousness the conviction we have of our past actions, as if a man may now be conscious of what he did twenty years ago. It is impossible to understand the meaning of this, unless by consciousness is meant memory, the only faculty by which we have an immediate knowledge of our past actions. (EIP III. 6, p. 277)

The second issue is more serious. The problem has to do with the fact that Locke seems to require sameness of memory for sameness of person. The type of memory involved here is episodic memory, and this might be why Locke thinks that consciousness is something that is needed here: in order to remember something about oneself episodically, a person must remember the event “from the inside.” For instance, if someone remembers, episodically, having run a 5K race this past Sunday, that person cannot be mistaken regarding who was the agent of the act of running in the race. That particular person also could not be mistaken about what it felt like to run a 5K this past Sunday. These are all characteristics of episodic memory. Furthermore, if that particular person cannot be mistaken with regard to who was the agent of this act of running (namely that person himself), then that particular person must have existed this past Sunday, at the time of the race. In thinking that memory is necessary for personal identity, Locke doesn’t seem to commit a grave error of reasoning.

Reid, however, argues that this account is absurd, because it leads to absurd consequences. To show that he is right, Reid discusses the now famous case of the brave officer:

Suppose a brave officer to have been flogged when a boy at school, for robbing an orchard, to have taken a standard from the enemy in his first campaign, and to have been made a general in advanced life: Suppose also, which must be admitted to be possible, that when made a general he was conscious of his taking the standard, but had absolutely lost the consciousness of his flogging.

These things being supposed, it follows, from Mr. LOCKE’s doctrine, that he who was flogged at school is the same person who took the standard, and that he who took the standard is the same person who was made a general. When it follows, if there be any truth in logic, that the general is the same person with him who was flogged at school. But the general’s consciousness does not reach so far back as his flogging, therefore, according to Mr. LOCKE’s doctrine, he is not the person who was flogged. Therefore the general is, and at the same time is not the same person as him who was flogged at school. (EIP III. 6, p. 276)

This case, which builds upon an objection raised by Joseph Butler (1736), is supposed to show that personal identity, understood as consisting in memory, is not a consistent notion. Here is why: due to the transitivity of numerical identity, the old general should be numerically identical with the kid who was flogged for robbing an orchard. This should follow, on the assumption that the kid who was flogged is numerically the same as the brave officer, who, in turn, is supposed to be numerically the same as the old general. Memory ensures that the boy who was flogged is the same as the brave officer, since the brave officer remembers that incident from his childhood. It ensures, moreover, that the general is the same as the brave officer, since the general remembers (episodically) that event from his youth. But, on Locke’s theory of identity, Reid claims, the general is not the same person as the kid robbing the orchard, since the general does not remember (episodically) that event from his childhood. There are two possibilities: (i) either to explain personal identity without making recourse to numerical identity, since transitivity holds for numerical identity, but this example shows that transitivity fails for personal identity. Or, (ii) to give up Locke’s theory of personal identity, since any theory that does not respect the rules of logic is irremediably flawed.

Reid chooses (ii) and argues that memory is neither necessary nor sufficient for personal identity. Memory is not a necessary condition for personhood, since during their lives, human beings witness or are the agents of many events of which they have no recollection at later moments of time. However, it would be absurd to claim that just because someone doesn’t remember something having happened, that person wasn’t actually there. Here is what Reid says on the issue: “I may have other good evidence of things which befell me, and which I do not remember: I know who bare me, and suckled me, but I do not remember these events” (EIP III. 4, p. 264). Neither is memory a sufficient condition for personal identity, according to Reid, since even though someone may be able to remember episodically that he was the agent or the witness of an event, it is not his remembering the event that makes it the case that he himself is the same person he was then. “It may here be observed […] that it is not my remembering any action of mine that makes me to be the person who did it. This remembrance makes me to know assuredly that I did it; but I might have done it, though I did not remember it” (EIP III. 4, p. 265). Memory gives someone immediate knowledge of a past event that person was the witness to or agent of, but it does not ensure that that person was actually there at the time of the event.

Reid’s theory of personal identity is deflationary: he argues that this notion is primitive. The only way to understand more about this relation is by contrast to other relations: “I can say that diversity is a contrary notion, and that similitude and dissimilitude are another couple of contrary relations, which every man easily distinguishes in his conception from identity and diversity” (EIP III. 4, p. 263). Just like Locke before him, Reid acknowledges that identity, in general (thus including the special case of personal identity), presupposes “an uninterrupted continuance of existence” (EIP III. 4, p. 263). Due to this feature of identity, there is no way to think that mental states and processes remain identical over time:

Hence we may infer, that identity cannot, in its proper sense, be applied to our pains, our pleasures, our thoughts, or any operation of our minds. The pain felt this day is not the same individual pain which I felt yesterday, though they may be similar in kind and degree, and have the same cause. The same may be said of every feeling, and of every operation of the mind: They are all successive in their nature like time itself, no two moments of which can be the same moment. (EIP III. 4, p. 263)

Thus, Reid thinks that persons should not be identified with their thoughts or feelings, but with the subject of such thoughts and feelings, which remains the same over time. This subject is an immaterial substance, a soul, which is best understood by reference to Leibniz’s notion of a monad (EIP III. 4, p. 264).

4. Intellectual Powers (Proper)

a. Conception

The fourth Essay is dedicated to conception, whose primary role is to be an ingredient (or concomitant) in all other operations of the mind. In this picture, conception is being used as part of the endeavor to gain knowledge of the external world (when it is employed by the senses), of the internal world (when it is employed by consciousness), and also to analyze the complex relationships that exist among the objects of the world, among numbers in mathematics, and among rules of reasoning in logic. As such, conception is a faculty that acts as a bridge, connecting the information gathered by the senses with the intellectual processing powers of judgment and reasoning.

Since conception is a simple operation of the mind, it cannot be subjected to a reductive definition any more than the other operations can be. However, as always, Reid argues that it has certain features which are useful to know in order to better understand how it functions, both when it is an ingredient or concomitant of other operations, and when it is employed on its own, as “bare conception.”

Reid argues that conception is an ingredient in all of the other operations of the human mind:

Our senses cannot give us the belief of any object, without giving some conception of it at the same time: No man can either remember or reason about things of which he hath no conception: When we will to exert any of our active powers, there must be some conception what we will to do: There can be no desire or aversion, love nor hatred, without some conception of the object: We cannot feel pain without conceiving it, though we can conceive it without feeling it. These things are self-evident. (EIP IV. 1, 296)

As already pointed out, the argument that sensations must be intentional, and hence take themselves as objects, is based on this idea that every operation of the mind has conception as an ingredient. The passage quoted above can indeed be read as saying that one must conceive of the pain one is feeling at a given moment of time in order to actually be able to feel it. However, it is controversial in Reid scholarship what exactly “conception” is supposed to mean in this context, despite its name. The issue concerns the fact that Reid believes that human beings share most of their perceptual and sensory abilities with lower-level animals and with human infants, who do not have a well-developed conceptual framework; thus, some authors argue that “conception” should not be taken to mean that unless one is able to have and deploy fully formed concepts, one will not be able to feel pain, for instance. In this interpretation, conception should be understood as the operation that allows beings endowed with this faculty to get acquainted with an object, be that object something that exists in the present, existed in the past, or will never exist.

On the other side of this controversy are those authors who point out that it is rather counter-intuitive to believe that conception does not operate via concepts—after all, the name might be indicative of something here. The role of conception, as an ingredient in all the other operations of the human mind, is to allow humans to secure a mental grip on something. Such a mental grip is secured by deploying a singular concept, understood to be something like a uniquely identifying definite description. In this interpretation, a being would not be able to have a sensation, a perception, or a memory unless it was able to deploy a singular concept, a uniquely identifying definite description isolating that thing in the world.

i. Bare Conception

Reid calls conception, as employed on its own, and not as an ingredient in any of the other operations of the human mind, “bare conception.” This suggests that when employed on its own, conception has a different role than when employed by a faculty of the mind in which it enters as an ingredient: “yet it may be found naked, detached from all others, and then it is called simple apprehension, or the bare conception of a thing” (EIP IV. 1, p. 286).

One of the most interesting features of bare conception is its ability to be used to think about objects without any heed being paid to their existence or non-existence, and also about propositions, without any judgment of their truth or falsity.

In bare conception there can neither be truth nor falsehood, because it neither affirms nor denies. Every judgment, and every proposition by which judgment is expressed, must be true or false; and the qualities of true and false, in their proper sense, can belong to nothing but to judgments, or to propositions which express judgment. In the bare conception of a thing there is no judgment, opinion, or belief included, and therefore it cannot be either true or false. (EIP IV. 1, p. 296)

Conception, in this sense, is that faculty allowing human beings to grasp the meaning of a proposition, which is the prerequisite for being able to judge a certain proposition as true or false: “it is one thing to conceive the meaning of a proposition; it is another to judge it to be true or false” (EIP I. 1, p. 25). Things are being conceived by beings endowed with this faculty in the following manner: an object is brought before the mind, with the help of conception: “I conceive an Egyptian pyramid. […] the thing conceived may be no proposition, but a simple term only, as a pyramid, an obelisk” (EIP I. 1, p. 25). Bare conception seems to require the mind of the conceiver to use certain concepts—simple terms—to bring forth objects to the mind in a way in which conception, when employed as an ingredient in other operations of the human mind, does not. This should not be surprising, though: once someone is able to think about something, even when he is not perceiving or remembering it, his mind will have established a certain grasp of that thing, classified and analyzed it, such that he will be able to think about it without using any of his other faculties. How this comes about will be better understood once Reid’s accounts of abstraction, judgment, and reasoning are presented, but it is already worth noting that it is not conception that supplies the mind with the most simple and exact notions the mind has of external things; these are acquired by using the mind’s superior reasoning powers (EIP IV. 1, p. 309).

Ideas as acts of the mind. Bare conception can be understood by analogy with painting, Reid argues, but he warns us that analogous thinking can take us only so far. Conception should be distinguished from painting, since “[t]he action of painting is one thing, the picture produced is another thing. The first is the cause, the second is the effect” (EIP IV. 1, p. 300). Reid’s worry is that that conception will be thought to work in the same way, to produce images of things in the mind, or ideas. Reid denies that this is the case, and puts forward a theory of ideas as acts of minds rather than objects of such mental operations: “Let this therefore be always remembered, that what is commonly called the image of a thing in the mind, is no more than the act or operation of the mind in conceiving it” (EIP, IV. 1, p. 300). To unpack this further, let us think about the elements involved in conceiving that the sun is yellow, for instance. Reid argues that in this act of conception, there are the following three elements: a mind, an act of conception that the sun is yellow, and the thing itself—the sun—external to the mind in question. Furthermore, he argues that there is something missing: an image in the mind, an additional representation, that has the explicit content of a yellow sun. He is willing to assert that this is just a verbal dispute, if everyone else is willing to agree with him that these images in the mind, or ideas, are nothing more than acts of conceiving—a moot point, given that everyone else was dead at the point when he was writing, and no one could have agreed with him. But, in effect, this is a serious conceptual point.

The analogy with painting should help classify conceptions into three classes, according to Reid. Just like a painter paints by using his imagination, by copying from other paintings, or by painting live subjects, there are conceptions which can be called “creatures of fancy”—like Don Quixote or Pegasus; conceptions of universals—which are analogous to paintings which copy other paintings; and conceptions of individual (existing) things—which are like paintings of live subjects.

Our conceptions, therefore, appear to be of three kinds: They are either the conceptions of individual things, the creatures of God; or they are conceptions of the meaning of general words; or they are the creatures of our own imagination. (EIP IV. 1, p. 305)

There are two issues worthy of attention in this classification: (i) Reid argues that people can name the creatures of fancy they invent, “conceive them distinctly, and reason consequentially concerning them, though they never had an existence” (EIP IV. 1, p. 301-2). And (ii) conceiving universals—like kinds and species of things—means nothing more nor less than to conceive the “meaning which other men who understand the language affix to the same words” (EIP IV. 1, p. 302). The first of these issues shows Reid to think that it is possible for fictional names to be used in the same way as regular names, even though the former category will be used to name nonexistents.

Reid’s Meinongeanism. Based on Reid’s idea that people can think and “reason consequentially” about fictional characters and objects, Nichols (2002) argued that Reid is a precursor of Meinong. Reid’s rejection of the way of ideas and his dedication to common sense philosophy are thought to amount to a rejection of the position according to which conceiving the nonexistent means nothing more than conceiving images or any other types of mental intermediaries. Centaurs, not centaur-inspired images or ideas, are the objects of such centaur thoughts. The only exception is constituted by a thought which is explicitly about a painting of a centaur, in which case it should be obvious to everyone that what is being conceived is an image, and not a mythological animal.

This one object which I conceive [a centaur], is not the image of an animal, it is an animal. I know what it is to conceive an image of an animal, and what it is to conceive an animal; and I can distinguish the one of these from the other without any danger of mistake. (EIP, IV. 2, p. 321)

Reid does not talk about different levels of existence; there is no doubt that centaurs do not exist as flesh-and-blood animals. It is important, however, to note that Reid ascribes intentionality to all the operations of the human mind, and this intentionality is to be resolved by understanding how conception works.

ii. Imagination

At the beginning of the EIP, when Reid is defining the terms he is going to use throughout the book, and at the beginning of the fourth Essay, where he lays down his views on conception, he claims that “conception” and “imagination” are synonymous words, and, moreover, that no reductive definition of these notions can be given, since they are supposed to denote simple operations of the mind. However, in the course of his analysis of conception, it becomes clear that imagination is not exactly the same thing as conception.

Reid argues that “imagination,” when used with its proper meaning, denotes a type of conception that is concerned primarily with the objects of sight (EIP IV. 3, p. 326). This restriction to sight probably has more to do with etymology than with the proper meaning of “imagination.” Imagination is supposed to apply to other senses, although Reid thinks that such uses are not altogether proper (EIP V. 6, p. 394). Any conception is of the imaginative kind when it is lively and about possible objects of sense. One consequence is that people can never be said to imagine universals, or propositions; neither are people supposed to think that anyone is imagining objects of sense, when they are actually perceiving them. A different kind of conception is responsible for the proper workings of perception.

Reid’s distinction between conception proper and imagination is one of the first instances in philosophy of mind in which imagination is presented as a faculty of the human mind related most closely to perception. Reid’s main breakthrough is his arguing that conception proper is used for understanding and acquiring general and abstract concepts, while imagination is used to think about things that might have existed, and, as such, might have presented beings endowed with such a faculty or system with perceptual stimuli.

b. Judgment and Reasoning

Reid dedicates two essays to the mental powers of judgment and reasoning with which he believes human beings to be endowed by nature. Essay VI, the one dedicated to judgment, presents the main elements of what Reid takes to be the philosophy of common sense. After a general introduction, in which he describes the fundamental characteristics of judgment, Reid argues that certain principles should be taken for granted as true. These are the first principles of common sense, which describe how the external and internal worlds work. These principles are self-evident and as such their truth cannot be demonstrated through any kind of reasoning. In the following essay, dedicated to reasoning, Reid argues that it is the purview of this faculty to produce judgments, or to combine and analyze them, in two main ways: deductively or probably. In what follows, these issues are discussed in turn, by first explaining what Reid thought about judgment, and then providing a schematic account of how deductive reasoning is supposed to be applied to the class of necessary truths, while probable reasoning is supposed to be applied to the class of contingent truths.

i. The Fundamental Characteristics of Judgment

Reid talks about judging in terms of offering mental assent or dissent to the issues represented by any particular judgment. Reid thinks that if human beings were not endowed with such an operation, they would not be able to reason abstractly. Without analyzing, abstracting, and judging when they reached correct conclusions, human beings would have been given reasoning in vain:

[S]ome exercise of judgment is necessary in the formation of all abstract and general conceptions, whether more simple or more complex; in dividing, in defining, and in general, in forming all clear and distinct conceptions of things, which are the only fit materials of reasoning. (EIP VI. 1, p. 413)

Some authors argue that judging should not be understood as involving just mental affirming or denial of its content, since that would not distinguish judging from believing. Although Reid’s official characterization of judgment is meant to clarify how this mental operation accompanies all others, belief already implies a mental assent/dissent given to its content. In the picture Reid is putting forward, there seems to be no way to explain why somebody would assent (dissent) to something without that person’s already having a belief that it is true (or false). Judgment, therefore, seems to presuppose belief. Judgment, then, would simply be superfluous, while belief would be ubiquitous, either as a concomitant or an ingredient in all other operations of the human mind (Rysiew (2004): 65). This, however, contradicts Reid’s official characterization of judgment:

[A] man who feels pain, judges and believes that he is really pained. The man who perceives an object, believes that it exists, and is what he distinctly perceives it to be; nor is it in his power to avoid such judgment. And the like may be said of memory, and of consciousness. Whether judgment ought to be called a necessary concomitant of these operations, or rather a part or ingredient of them, I do not dispute. But it is certain, that all of them are accompanied with a determination that something is true or false, and a consequent belief. If this determination be not judgment, it is an operation that has got no name; for it is not simple apprehension, neither is it reasoning; it is a mental affirmation or negation; it may be expressed by a proposition affirmative or negative, and it is accompanied with the firmest belief. (EIP VI. 1, p. 409)

To save Reid from this inconsistency, some have argued that the distinctive character of judgment emerges not from his official characterization of this mental operation, but rather from his comparing it to an external, real-life tribunal. This analogy is not perfect, and per Reid’s instructions (EIP I. 4, p. 55), people should not be lulled into a sense of confidence that they really know what they are talking about when they invoke analogous thinking, especially with regard to analogies concerning the body—or all things external—and mind—or all things internal. However, people are entitled to use the same name—“judgment”—to refer to both the process that results in an assenting/dissenting opinion in a court of law, and to the one that results in an assenting/dissenting belief in the internal tribunal, in virtue of the process involving reasoned reflection and deliberation. The fundamental characteristic of judgment in Reid’s system is its deliberative/reflective character, and not its relation to assent or dissent, which is, in turn, reserved for belief (Rysiew (2004): 67).

ii. Common Sense

Reid argues that sense and judgment are intrinsically related, such that sense always implies judgment: “A man of sense is a man of judgment” (EIP VI. 2, p. 424). He believes this to hold true both for what he calls “the external senses” (for instance, touch, taste, sight) and for the so-called “internal senses” (for instance, moral sense and internal taste). Since Reid believes (mistakenly, as it was discussed above) that judgment is the operation of the mind that helps people determine, “concerning any thing that might be expressed by a proposition, whether it be true or false” (EIP VI. 3, p. 435), and since he talks about common sense in the Essay dedicated to illuminating the nature of judgment, it should be obvious that he thinks that common sense is a specialized kind of judgment, understood as a faculty of the human mind. To wit, Reid thinks that common sense is that minimal degree of understanding that every adult human being possesses (or should possess), such that he can function well in this world. Common sense is concerned only with propositions that express self-evident truths (or falsehoods); judgment, more generally, is concerned with propositions that express any other kinds of truths or falsehoods.

Reid believes that self-evident principles are at the foundation of any kind of knowledge and that common sense is the mental operation that discovers such principles for human beings:

All knowledge, and all science, must be built upon principles that are self-evident; and of such principles, every man who has common sense is a competent judge, when he conceives them distinctly. Hence it is, that disputes often terminate in an appeal to common sense. (EIP VI. 2, p. 426)

This suggests that Reid thinks that human beings are all endowed with a mental operation—common sense—that is meant to discover the first principles upon which any kind of science is built. These first principles, when considered distinctly, namely in isolation from anything else, will be immediately found to be true, just as anything parading as a first principle, when considered distinctly, will be found to be false. No one undergoes a complicated reasoning procedure to discover the truth (or falsehood) of such principles; everyone just knows this, because, in being self-evident, these principles wear their truths conspicuously. In other words, what results from exercising the faculty of common sense is intuitive knowledge. Reid explains that reason and common sense do not conflict, because common sense is part of reason, just as judging does not oppose reason:

We ascribe to reason two offices, or two degrees. The first is to judge of things self-evident; the second to draw conclusions that are not self-evident from those that are. The first of these is the province, and the sole province of common sense; and therefore it coincides with reason in its whole extent, and is only another name for one branch or one degree of reasoning. (EIP VI. 2, p. 433)

Deduction from true principles can never contradict common sense, since “truth will always be consistent with itself” (EIP VI. 2, p. 433).

iii. First Principles of Common Sense

Reid thus believes that human beings are endowed with a faculty that gives them immediate knowledge of self-evident principles. He calls this faculty “common sense,” but it is more common to refer to the results of employing this faculty by the name of “intuitive knowledge.” The main idea here is that such knowledge of first principles is widespread: for instance, people are said to intuit axioms in mathematics and in logic; they also are thought to intuit first principles in morals, just as they intuit first principles regarding the expression of beauty in the arts, Reid believes. This knowledge is not innate; after all, as an Empiricist, Reid thinks that all knowledge is acquired. The faculty of common sense, just like all the other original faculties, is innate, in the sense that they are part of the mental architecture of a human being. The sense in which this intuitive knowledge is immediate, without it being innate is the following: once reasoning and the ability to process a human language are sufficiently developed, a human being will be able to know, non-inferentially, that certain propositions, when considered distinctly, are true.

Reid calls such propositions first principles, and he argues that they can be divided into two classes: first principles of contingent truths, on the one hand, and first principles of necessary truth, on the other. As Van Cleve (1999) points out, just because the former type of principles have contingent truths as their contents, this does not mean that the principles themselves are, in any way, less necessary than those of necessary truths. It is the truths themselves that are either necessary or contingent:

The truths that fall within the compass of human knowledge, whether they be self-evident, or deduced from those that are self-evident, may be reduced to two classes. They are either necessary and immutable truths, whose contrary is impossible, or they are contingent and mutable, depending upon some effect of will and power, which had a beginning, and may have an end. (EIP VI. 5, p. 468)

Since this article is concerned with the main tenets of Reid’s philosophy of mind, first principles are interesting for this purpose only in as much as they are discovered by a faculty—common sense—with which every human being is supposed to be endowed, and they will not be discussed in more detail.

iv. Reasoning

If the first principles of common sense are discovered by employing the operation of intuitive judging, reasoning proper is to be employed to discover whatever conclusions follow from self-evident principles. Since there are two classes of first principles, Reid argues that there are two types of reasoning. Demonstrative reasoning is employed to draw conclusions that follow from the first principles of necessary truths, whereas probable reasoning is employed to draw conclusions that follow from the first principles of contingent truths (EIP VII. 3, p. 556).

The strength of demonstrative reasoning, which is commonly employed in mathematics and logic, is such that for showing that a conclusion follows from some axioms (or first principles) nothing else needs to be done other than offering one demonstration. Reid thinks that it would be superfluous to try to give several different demonstrations to prove one conclusion, while employing demonstrative reasoning, even though a variety of proofs may be available in practice:

To add more demonstrations of the same conclusion, would be a kind of tautology in reasoning; because one demonstration, clearly comprehended, gives all the evidence we are capable of receiving. (EIP VII. 3, p. 556)

It is not so with probable reasoning:

The strength of probable reasoning …depends not upon any one argument, but upon many, which unite their force, and lead to the same conclusion. Any one of them by itself would be insufficient to convince; but the whole taken together may have a force that is irresistible, so that to desire more evidence would be absurd. (EIP VII. 3, p. 556)

Probable reasoning is the method of choice for all the natural sciences, whose true propositions are contingent. According to Reid, probable reasoning comes in degrees, whereas demonstrative reasoning does not admit degrees; it is absolute.

In every step of demonstrative reasoning, the inference is necessary, and we perceive it to be impossible that the conclusion should not follow from the premises. In probable reasoning, the connection between the premises and the conclusion is not necessary, nor do we perceive it to be impossible that the first should be true while the last is false. (EIP VII. 1, p. 544-45)

Although Reid argues that probable reasoning is of a different kind than demonstrative reasoning (EIP VII. 3, p. 557), according to Lehrer (1989: 174), probable reasoning can lead to conclusions that are certain. Reid thinks that the vulgar is mistaken when contrasting probable reasoning with certainty. Probable reasoning, according to Reid, has degrees of evidence, “from the very least to the greatest which we call certainty” (EIP VII. 3, p. 557).

Hume, in the Treatise, argues that all knowledge should be reduced to probability, because human beings are fallible creatures, endowed with fallible faculties. Reid’s understanding of probable reasoning as a type of reasoning that leads to certain conclusions constitutes a direct refutation of Hume’s argument. The problem, Reid points out, is that requiring a proof of the reliability of the human faculties would be circular, because it could be given only by using those reasoning powers themselves, “and is therefore that kind of sophism which Logicians call petitio principii” (or “begging the question”) (EIP VII. 4, p. 571). Hume writes that “[n]ature, by an absolute and uncontrollable necessity, has determined us to judge, as to breathe and feel” (Hume, Treatise I.iv.1, p. 183). Reid agrees with Hume in part: probable reasoning concerning cause and effect, for instance, is the result of an innate principle of human constitution. Such a principle is known to be true, by intuition, and by exercising the faculty of common sense. But Reid also disagrees with Hume, and points out that probable reasoning concerning cause and effect is not merely a matter of custom. The relevant first principle of contingent truth allows human beings to be certain that effect follows its cause, not because they reason that it is so, but because they judge (intuitively) that it is so.

5. Taste

Reid considers the principles of the so-called “internal taste” in Essay VIII, the last of the EIP. Contemporary philosophy of mind is mostly silent concerning the way human beings interact and appreciate works of art; the widespread belief seems to be that such issues belong to value theory rather than to the philosophy of mind proper. Reid, however, is part of a different tradition, which sought to explain the interest humans have in art and its artifacts, and consequently the interactions humans seek with said artifacts starting by observing human psychology. As such, he, just like some of his predecessors (for example, Hume, Hutcheson, and Shaftesbury), thinks that adult human beings are endowed with a special faculty, taste, which is supposed to help them appreciate beautiful or aesthetically relevant things, and disapprove those that are found to be lacking the sought-after qualities. Reid is thus mostly describing and analyzing the aesthetic experience, rather than addressing issues that are relevant from the point of view of the philosophy of art. In the course of doing this, however, he is interested in questions pertaining to art and artworks. Reid has an expression theory of art, in that he is interested in how art can express emotion, or, better still, how artists can and do express emotions through an artistic medium. If art is a sort of language, the faculty of taste, as applied to the aesthetic qualities of artworks, is the way to be made privy to this language: by employing this faculty, human beings become sensitive to the signs and decode their meaning. However, this is not the only way people employ their internal sense: by using this faculty they also become sensitive to the aesthetic qualities of the world. Reid’s idea is that just like a painter is expressing an emotion in his works, God is expressing certain emotions in his works. One cannot gain complete knowledge of the external world, in this picture, unless one understands and appreciates the beauty of the world.

a. Why This Faculty Is Called “Internal Taste”

This name indicates that the faculty itself is of the same kin as the other type of taste, but in what sense is it “internal”? To better understand this, consider the distinction that Reid draws between things internal and things external to the mind at the beginning of the EIP:

When…we speak of things in the mind, we understand by this, things of which the mind is the subject. Excepting the mind itself, and things in the mind, all other things are said to be external. (EIP I. 1, p. 22)

This distinction is as elucidating as it is confusing: since both types of taste are operations of the mind, they both are, in a sense, internal. However, Reid’s idea is that the “external taste” is supposed to help those beings that have it register information about certain pleasing and displeasing qualities of food and drink. The objects that can be food and drink are external to the mind—they are physical things to be found in the world. So, by analogy, it should probably be thought that “the internal taste” is supposed to help those beings that are endowed with it register information about certain pleasing and displeasing qualities of internal objects—namely, minds and their qualities.

Reid does not argue that other minds can be directly perceived, but he takes it to be a first principle of common sense that other minds exist (the 8th first principle of contingent truths, EIP VI. 5, p. 482-483), and that people learn of their existence by correctly deciphering certain signs. This interpretation of natural signs is innate, since, Reid claims, even small children respond in the correct (that is, expected) way in the presence of an angry parent, for instance. In this picture, the internal sense of taste is meant to discern the quality of excellence that other minds possess, in addition to enhancing the knowledge people have of “the existence of life and intelligence in our fellow-men.” To do so, however, the internal taste orients itself to material objects (since it cannot directly interact with other minds), and identifies that which is beautiful, in nature and in the fine arts (EIP VIII. 1, p. 573).

b. An Objectivist Account of Beauty

Putting everything together, here is the picture that emerges: Reid believes that beauty is a property both of objects and of minds. Moreover, he thinks that beauty itself is both a primary and a secondary quality of objects. Reid’s claim that beauty is a real property of objects directly opposes the idea that beauty is just a feeling in an agent’s mind, advanced by Hume and Hutcheson. As in morals, in the domain of aesthetic value, Reid is an objectivist (at least, according to Benbaji (1999)). The aesthetic (or internal) taste has the dual role of discovering what material objects are beautiful, and, indirectly, what minds, which created those beautiful objects, are inherently beautiful. Beauty, in this picture, is not a feeling in one’s mind, but something external to one’s mind. The internal taste is used to reach aesthetic judgments by evaluating material objects, which express the mental attributes of the artist. Without excellence in the mind, no product of that mind can be perceived as beautiful. Beauty is thus a property of the artist’s mind, and is displayed by the artifacts he creates only in a derivative sense. The internal taste functions very much like perception of external objects: certain signs of aesthetic qualities function to trigger a conception and belief in the existence of the aesthetic quality in question. The internal taste is thus assimilated to the external sense of taste, since both senses are supposed to contribute to the perception of specific qualities of objects.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Hume, D. (2007). A Treatise of Human Nature. Oxford: Clarendon Press. (Original work published in 1739-40.)
- The standard edition of Hume’s Treatise.
Hume, D. (1874-75). “Of the Standard of Taste,” in vol. 3 of The Philosophical Works of David Hume. Edited by T. H. Green and T. H. Grose. 4 volumes, London: Longman, Green.
- Hume considers whether there can be any objective standard of taste.
Hutcheson, F. (2004). An Inquiry into the Original of Our Ideas of Beauty and Virtue. Edited by W. Leidhold. Indianapolis: Liberty Fund. (Original work published in 1726.)
- This presents Hutcheson’s sentimentalist understanding of beauty.
Locke, J. (1979). An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Oxford: Clarendon Press. (Original work published in 1700.)
- This is the standard edition of Locke’s Essay.
Reid, T. (1997) An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense. Edited by Derek R. Brookes. Edinburgh, UK: Edinburgh University Press. (Original work published in 1764.)
- This is the standard edition of Reid’s Inquiry. Cited in text as IHM, chapter, section, page number. Cited in text as Essay, book, chapter, section number.
Reid, T. (2002) Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man—A Critical Edition. Edited by Derek R. Brookes. Edinburgh, UK: Edinburgh University Press. (Original work published in 1785.)
- This is the standard edition of Reid’s work on the intellectual powers. Cited in text as EIP, essay, chapter, page number.
Reid, T. (2010) Essays on the Active Powers of Man—A Critical Edition. Edited by Knud Haakonssen and James A. Harris. Edinburgh, UK: Edinburgh University Press. (Original work published in 1788.)
- This is the standard edition of Reid’s published work on action theory.

b. Secondary Sources

Alston, W. P. (1989). “Reid on Perception and Conception.” In M. Dalgarno, & E. Matthews (Eds.) The Philosophy of Thomas Reid, (pp. 35–47). Dordrecht: Kluwer.
- Argues that conception, despite its name, does not involve the use of any concepts.
Benbaji, H. (1999). “Reid’s View of Aesthetic and Secondary Qualities.” Reid Studies 2, 31-46.
Buras, T. (2005). “The Nature of Sensations in Reid.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 22(3), 221–238.
- Interprets Reid as saying that sensations are reflexive acts of the mind, taking themselves as objects.
Buras, T. (2008). “Three Grades of Immediate Perception: Thomas Reid’s Distinctions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 76(3), 603–632.
- Explains that there are three senses of “immediacy,” in Reid, making clear the connection between immediacy and original perception, and acquired perception.
Buras, T. (2009). “The Function of Sensations in Reid.” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 47(3), 329–353.
- Explains what function sensations perform: primarily, they give sentient beings information about how they react to the environment.
Copenhaver, R. (2000). “Thomas Reid’s Direct Realism.” Reid Studies, 4(1), 17–34.
- Explains Reid’s account of perception, classifying it as direct realism.
Copenhaver, R. (2004). “A Realism for Reid: Mediated but Direct.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 12(1), 61–74.
- Explains the intermediary role of sensations in the chain of perception.
Copenhaver, R. (2010). “Thomas Reid on Acquired Perception.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 91(3), 285–312.
- Offers a compelling argument to show that acquired perception is indeed a form of perception, and not reasoning.
Copenhaver, R. (2006a). “Thomas Reid’s Philosophy of Mind: Consciousness and Intentionality.” Philosophy Compass, 1(3), 279–289.
- Offers a comprehensive explanation of Reid’s philosophy of mind, centered on the concept of intentionality.
Copenhaver, R. (2006b). “Thomas Reid’s Theory of Memory.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 23(2), 171–187.
- Discusses the ways in which memory gives people direct knowledge of the past, according to Reid.
Copenhaver, R. (2009). “Reid on Memory and Personal Identity.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/reid-memory-identity/
- Offers a comprehensive account of Reid’s theory of memory.
Falkenstein, L. (2004). “Nativism and the Nature of Thought in Reid’s Account of Our Knowledge of the External World”. In T. Cuneo, & R. Van Woudenberg (Eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Reid, (pp. 156–179). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Explains Reid’s brand of nativism, which allows him to keep fixed certain principles which are dear to the British Empiricists.
Falkenstein, L. and Giovanni Grandi (2003). “The Role of Material Impressions in Reid’s Theory of Vision: A Critique of Gideon Yaffe’s ‘Reid on the Perception of the Visible Figure.’’’ Journal of Scottish Philosophy, 1(2), 117-133.
- Argue that no sensations are involved in the perception of visible figure.
Folescu, M. (2015). “Perceiving Bodies Immediately: Thomas Reid’s Insight.” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 32(1), 19–36.
- Argues that bodies are objects of original perception, despite perceivers’ gaining only relative (that is, not direct) notions of them by the use of their senses.
Folescu, M. (2015). “Perceptual and Imaginative Conception.” In Todd Buras and Rebecca Copenhaver (eds.), Mind, Knowledge and Action: Essays in Honor of Reid’s Tercentenary, (pp. 52–74). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Argues that Reid should have been sensitive to the fact that conception is not employed in the same manner by the perceptual and by the imaginative systems, respectively.
Folescu, M. “Thinking About Different Nonexistents Of The Same Kind.” Published online first in Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. DOI: 10.1111/phpr.12196
- Argues that Reid’s account provides the tools for entertaining singular imaginings of different fantastical creatures of the same kind.
Gallie, R. (1997). “Reid: Conception, Representation and Innate Ideas.” Hume Studies, 23(2), 315-35.
- Argues that conception requires linguistic representation.
Ganson, T. (2008). “Reid’s Rejection of Intentionalism.” Oxford Studies in Early Modern Philosophy, 4, 245–263.
- Argues that sensation is not intentional: it is not about any objects, be those objects the sensations themselves.
Kivy, P. (2004). “Reid’s Philosophy of Art.” In T. Cuneo, & R. Van Woudenberg (Eds.) The Cambridge Companion to Reid, (pp. 267–312). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Argues that Reid is one of the first philosophers interested in philosophy of art, rather than aesthetics, in general.
Kivy, P. (1978). “Thomas Reid and the Expression Theory of Art.” The Monist, 61(2), 167–183.
- Argues that Reid has, primarily, an expression theory of the arts: artworks express the emotions of their creators.
Kroeker, E. R. (2010). “Reid on Natural Signs, Taste and Moral Perception.” In S. Roeser (Ed.), Reid on Ethics: Philosophers in Depth, (pp. 46–66). Palgrave Macmillan.
- Argues that original beauty and other aesthetic qualities are intrinsic qualities of minds.
Lehrer, K. (1978). “Reid on Primary and Secondary Qualities.” The Monist, 61(2), 184–191.
- Presents and defends the distinction between these two types of properties of objects.
Lehrer, K. (1989). Thomas Reid. London and New York: Routledge.
- Offers a comprehensive exposition of Reid’s philosophy.
Manns, J. W. (1988). “Beauty and Objectivity in Thomas Reid.” British Journal of Aesthetics, 28, 119–131.
- Argues that beauty is objective, for Reid, on the principles of common sense, but not objective, on the correct philosophical principles.
Nauckhoff, J. C. (1994). “Objectivity and Expression in Thomas Reid’s Aesthetics.” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism, 52, 183–191.
- Argues that minds are excellent, hence beautiful, and that any other object deemed beautiful has that quality in virtue of being a sign of some excellence.
Nichols, R. (2002). “Reid on Fictional Objects and The Way of Ideas.” The Philosophical Quarterly, 52(209), 582–601.
- Argues that Reid’s rejection of the “way of ideas” leads him to adopt a form of moderate Meinongeanism, before Meinong.
Nichols, R. (2007). Thomas Reid’s Theory of Perception. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Analyzes the major tenets of Reid’s theory of perception.
Pappas, G. S. (1989). “Sensation and Perception in Reid.” Noûs, 23(2), 155–167.
- Defends the distinction between sensation and perception in Reid; a classic piece in Reid studies.
Rysiew, P. (1999). “Reid’s [Mis]charaterization of Judgment.” Reid Studies 3(1), 63–68.
- Argues that, despite his official characterization, “judgment,” for Reid, should be understood to mean reflection.
Tulving, E. (1983). Elements of Episodic Memory. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Explains what types of memory there are, and why episodic memory is fundamental.
Van Cleve, J. (1999). “Reid on the First Principles of Contingent Truths.” Reid Studies 3, 3–30.
- Argues that the first principles of contingent truths allow Reid to be a reliabilist with regard to the cognitive faculties of human beings, without any kind of circularity.
Van Cleve, J. (2004). “Reid’s Theory of Perception.” In T. Cuneo, & R. Van Woudenberg (Eds.) The Cambridge Companion to Reid, (pp. 101–133). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- A comprehensive account of Reid’s theory of perception, with special care given to identifying Reid’s type of realism: direct or indirect. This is the best starting point for anyone interested in getting a better understanding of Reid’s theory of perception.
Van Woudenberg, R. (1999). “Thomas Reid on Memory.” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 37(1), 117–133.
- Discusses the elements of Reid’s theory of memory.
Van Woudenberg, R. (2004). “Reid on Memory and the Identity of Persons.” In T. Cuneo, & R. Van Woudenberg (Eds.) The Cambridge Companion to Thomas Reid, (pp. 204–221). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Discusses the role of memory in personal identity.
Wolterstorff, N. (2001). Thomas Reid and the Story of Epistemology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Explains Reid’s terminology and way of thinking such that contemporary epistemologists can see Reid as an exponent and precursor of some of the issues discussed today.
Yaffe, G. (2003a). “The Office of an Introspectible Sensation: A Reply to Falkenstein and Grandi.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy, 1(2), 135–140.
- Responds to the criticisms raised by Falkenstein and Grandi to the idea that all kinds of perceptions, including the perception of visible figure, involve sensations.
Yaffe, G. (2003b). “Reid on the Perception of Visible Figure.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy, 1(2), 103–115.
- Argues that perceiving the visible figure of objects, for Reid, involves having sensations of color.

Author Information

Marina Folescu
Email: folescum@missouri.edu
University of Missouri
U. S. A.

Demonstratives and Indexicals

In the philosophy of language, an indexical is any expression whose content varies from one context of use to another. The standard list of indexicals includes pronouns such as “I”, “you”, “he”, “she”, “it”, “this”, “that”, plus adverbs such as “now”, “then”, “today”, “yesterday”, “here”, and “actually”. Other candidates include the tenses of verbs, adjectives such as “local”, and a range of expressions such as “yea” or “so” as used in constructions such as “yea big” (said, for example, while holding one’s hands two feet apart). Certain indexicals, often called “pure indexicals”, have their content fixed automatically in a context of use in virtue of their meaning. “I”, “today”, and “actually” are common examples of pure indexicals. Other indexicals, often called “true demonstratives,” require some kind of additional supplementation in a context in order to successfully refer in the context. The demonstrative pronouns “this” and “that” are clear examples of true demonstratives, because they require something of the speaker—some kind of gesture, or some kind of special intention—in order to resolve what the speaker is referring to. Which expressions are pure indexicals and which are true demonstratives is itself a matter of controversy. (The terms “pure indexical” and “true demonstrative” are due, as with so much else on this topic, to David Kaplan.)

Contemporary philosophical and linguistic interest in indexicals and demonstratives arises from at least four sources. (i) Indexical singular terms such as “I” and true demonstratives such as “that” are perhaps the most plausible candidates in natural language for the philosophically controversial theory of direct reference (see section 3e). (ii) Indexicals and demonstratives provide important test cases for our understanding of the relationship between linguistic meaning (semantics) and language use (pragmatics). (iii) Indexicals and demonstratives raise interesting technical challenges for logicians seeking to provide formal models of correct reasoning in natural language. (iv) Indexicals raise fundamental questions in epistemology about our knowledge of ourselves and our location in time and space.

By far the most influential theory of the meaning and logic of indexicals is due to David Kaplan. Almost all work in the philosophy of language (and most work in linguistics) on indexicals and demonstratives since Kaplan’s seminal essay “Demonstratives” has been a development of or response to Kaplan’s theory. For this reason, the majority of this article focuses on the details of Kaplan’s theory. Before introducing Kaplan’s theory, however, it discusses the most important precursors to Kaplan, some of whose views have been revived and given new defenses in light of Kaplan’s work.

Some Preliminaries
Precursors to Kaplan’s Theory
Kaplan’s Semantic Theory of Indexicals
True Demonstratives
Kaplan’s Logic of Indexicals
1. The Core Idea of Kaplan’s Logic
2. Kaplan’s Other Semantic Theory
Objections to Kaplan’s Semantic Theory and Logic
Alternatives to Kaplan’s Theory of Indexicals
1. John Perry’s Reflexive-Referential Theory
2. Expression-Based Alternatives
References and Further Reading

1. Some Preliminaries

Indexicals are words or phrases. To talk carefully about them, we need some resources for talking carefully about words and phrases. There are more distinctions here than may be apparent at first glance. In the case of indexicals and demonstratives, some of these distinctions are crucial.

a. Expressions and Utterances

Suppose that a speaker, Greg, utters the sentence “I am hungry”. We can distinguish between the action that Greg has performed—the utterance—and the sentence or expression that Greg has uttered. If Molly also utters “I am hungry”, then Molly and Greg have uttered the same sentence, but they have performed different actions. There is also a way of talking about actions on which we can say that Molly and Greg have performed the same action—they have both uttered “I am hungry”—but this is not the way we will talk about actions here. As we will use the term, an utterance is a particular event that occurs at a particular time and place. In this sense, Greg’s utterance and Molly’s utterance are distinct events, because they occurred at different places (and perhaps at different times).

We will also generalize our use of “utterance” so that it refers to inscriptions—acts of writing sentences—as well as to acts of speaking. So if Greg and Molly each write “I love you” on a sheet of paper, we will say that they have performed different (though similar) utterances. Yet in this case as well, they have written the same sentence. This slight extension of the standard use of “utterance” is common in discussions of indexicals and demonstratives. As we will see below, written notes provide interesting test cases for certain theories of indexicals.

b. Types and Tokens

It is also important to distinguish an utterance from the particular concrete instance of a sentence, word, or phrase that is produced or used in the course of an utterance. This distinction is easiest to see in the case of writing, where an act of writing produces some concrete thing—ink or graphite marks on a page, chalk marks on a blackboard, a specific distribution of pixels on a screen, and so forth. Following Charles Sanders Peirce, philosophers call these concrete instances of words, phrases, or sentences tokens. Tokens can also take the form of particular patterns of sound, as in the case of spoken language, and here again, it is important to distinguish the act of producing a particular pattern of sound—an utterance—from the particular pattern of sound produced—a token.

In our examples involving Greg and Molly above, we said that Greg and Molly each uttered the same sentence. This means that what we are calling the sentence that Greg and Molly both uttered is not the same thing as either of the tokens that they have produced. Again following Peirce, we will say that the tokens that Greg and Molly have each produced are instances or tokens of the same sentence type. Similarly, Greg and Molly have each produced tokens of the word type “I”. While tokens are concrete things, types are abstract. While tokens are located in particular places in space and time, types are not located anywhere.

The precise status and nature of types is a difficult question. Here are just two examples of the kinds of puzzles that arise when one begins to think about types versus tokens. (i) Are types universal? They seem to be, given that they are abstract objects that are in some sense instantiated by their tokens. (ii) In virtue of what are two tokens of the same type? In some cases, this may seem straightforward: if you are viewing this article on two different screens (or perhaps on a screen and a printed copy), you see two tokens of this sentence that are orthographically very similar to one another. But what about a token of “I am hungry” written by hand in a cursive script on a piece of paper, and another produced by Greg speaking the sentence? In virtue of what are these tokens of the same type? They have little in common in virtue of which we can say that they are similar. Despite these difficulties, we will continue to talk about tokens and types in the ways outlined above.

In what follows, the terms “word”. “phrase”, “sentence”, and “expression” will refer to types. Whenever we need to refer to particular tokens, we will use phrases such as “the token of the sentence ‘I am hungry’ produced by Greg”. Some philosophers are not always as careful about this usage as they could be, and anyone who wants to read further in the literature on the topic is warned to pay careful attention to how different philosophers talk about language. Some philosophers use a convention whereby putting a numeral before a sentence, as in the case of (1), allows them to use that numeral to refer to the sentence.

(1) I am hungry.

This is the convention that we follow in this article. Thus, our examples above involve different cases of speakers uttering (1) by producing different tokens of it. But other philosophers will use the numeral to refer to some hypothetical utterance of the sentence, and others to the token produced in such an utterance.

One further point is sometimes important in discussions of indexicals: an utterance of a sentence need not involve the production of a token of that sentence. For example, I might write a note on the top sheet of a Post-it pad that says “I will return at 2:30” and post it on my office door. Here I have produced a token of the sentence “I will return at 2:30”. But next week, I might use the same sheet again, by reposting it to my office door. This time, it seems that I am uttering the sentence “I will return at 2:30” by using a token that I produced earlier. Thus, when we speak of utterances, we will also mean to include cases like this in which an agent uses a previously produced token.

c. Occurrences

The distinctions above, between utterances and expression types and tokens, are common in discussions of language. There is one other category, however, that should be borne in mind when thinking about indexicals and demonstratives. To see this, consider first the kind of question that is commonly used to introduce the distinction between types and tokens:

How many words are written between the following pair of tokens of quotation marks: “a rose is a rose”?

The question here may be taken in different ways: three words have been written, but two of those words have been written twice. Thus, in the token of “a rose is a rose” above, there are two tokens of “a” and two of “rose”. So if you were to mark off the number of times that any token of a word appears between the tokens of the quotation marks above, you would count five tokens.

Now consider the question

How many words are in the sentence “a rose is a rose”?

Here there is only one correct answer. There are three words in the sentence: “a”, “rose”, and “is”. We can, however, say something else: two of these words occur twice in the sentence. This is not to say that there are two tokens of “a” and of “rose” in the sentence. That would be a mistake: the sentence is an abstract type, and tokens are concrete particulars. Instead of distinguishing between different tokens of “a” and of “rose” in the sentence, we distinguish between the different occurrences of “a” and of “rose” in the sentence. So there are three words in the sentence, but there are five occurrences of words

Occurrences, like types, but unlike tokens, are abstract. An occurrence of a word or phrase e within a larger phrase E may be thought of as a state of affairs: the state of affairs of e being located at a particular place in the structure of E. Thus, the two occurrences of “rose” in “a rose is a rose” are distinguished from each other according to where in the structure of “a rose is a rose” the word “rose” is located.

Despite the importance of distinguishing between occurrences and tokens, there are systematic relations between them. It is precisely because the sentence “a rose is a rose” contains two occurrences of “rose” that any token of the sentence will contain two tokens of “rose”. This relation will be important when we turn to theories of true demonstratives.

2. Precursors to Kaplan’s Theory

In the 20th century, there have been two basic approaches to the semantics of indexicals and demonstratives: utterance-based and expression-based theories. Almost all of the theories prior to David Kaplan’s influential theory have been utterance based. In early attempts to elaborate such theories, however, philosophers did not always pay due attention to the distinction above between utterances and the tokens produced (or used) in those utterances. The below discussion largely follows the original philosophers’ terminology, departing from it only to clarify where it is important to point out that they have elided the distinction between tokens and utterances.

a. Peirce on Indexical Signs

The term “indexical” is due originally to Charles Sanders Peirce, who introduced it as part of a threefold theory of signs. In this theory, Peirce distinguished between icons, indices, and symbols. All signs, on Peirce’s view, have the basic function of representing some object to some cognitive agent, but different kinds of signs accomplish this function in different ways. Icons represent an object to an agent by exhibiting or displaying to the agent the properties of the object they represent. A clear example of this is a diagram of a machine, which represents visually both the shapes of the parts and the structure of the machine.

Indices represent by standing in some kind of intimate relation to their objects. Peirce calls these relations “existential relations”, because indices cannot represent objects unless those objects exist to stand in the appropriate relations to them. Indices are a fundamental part of Peirce’s theory, but for Peirce, existential relations are easy to come by. This is because many causal relations count, for Peirce, as existential relations. As an example of an index, Peirce considers a hole in a wall: one can infer from the hole the existence of a gunshot in the room. Thus, the hole is an index of the gunshot.

As this example makes clear, indices in Peirce’s theory by themselves have little to do with language, or indeed with representation in any obvious sense. Indices in Peirce’s theory exhibit what H. P. Grice would later call natural meaning, wherein the presence of one state of affairs is a reliable indicator of the presence of another. Grice’s famous examples include that smoke means fire, and that presence of a certain rash means measles. Yet neither of these cases is plausibly an example of representation: the presence of smoke does not represent the presence of fire, nor does the presence of a particular rash represent the presence of measles.

Symbols, finally, represent their objects in virtue of conventions or rules that state that they stand in for those objects. Thus on Peirce’s view, all words of a language are symbols, because all words have their meanings conventionally. But some words are also indices. Peirce cites the demonstrative pronouns “this” and “that” as examples. On Peirce’s view, the conventional rules governing “this” and “that” dictate that a speaker can use them to refer to objects in the immediate perceptual environment. The audience of a successful use of a demonstrative can infer the existence of an object referred to—an “existential” relation. If the audience cannot infer the existence of an object referred to, then the use of a demonstrative has not been successful. Thus, demonstrative pronouns are both symbols (governed by conventional rules) and indices (representing objects in virtue of the existential relations they bear to those objects).

b. Russell on Egocentric Particulars

Bertrand Russell calls words like “I”, “here”, “now”, and so forth egocentric particulars. In Russell’s theory, all such expressions can be analyzed as descriptions involving the demonstrative pronoun “this”. So, for Russell, “now” means “the time of this” and “here” means “the place of this”. Russell offers different analyses of “I”, proposing at one time that it means “the person experiencing this”, and at another time that it means “the biography to which this belongs”. Thus on Russell’s analysis, all egocentric particulars can be reduced to one, and the status of egocentric particulars turns on the status of “this” (about which Russell held conflicting views at different times). According to Russell, this analysis of egocentric particulars captures an important feature of their use: that the reference (or denotation) of a particular utterance of an indexical is always relative to the speaker (and perhaps the time) of the utterance.

Yet Russell’s analysis fails on precisely the grounds that the interpretation of a particular utterance of “this” is not fixed merely by the identity of the speaker and the time of the utterance. This is because, as we see later, speakers can use “this” to refer to different things in their immediate environment. What a speaker refers to using “this” depends on some further feature of the context of the use: either the speaker makes some gesture, or there is enough common knowledge in the background that the speaker’s audience can identify what object the speaker intends to refer to (see section 4b below).

c. Reichenbach on Token-Reflexives

One of the most developed and influential theories of indexicals prior to Kaplan is due to Hans Reichenbach. Reichenbach’s theory is, in many ways, similar to Russell’s, but Reichenbach offers both a more sophisticated analysis of individual indexical expressions, and a more subtle treatment of the principles underlying the analysis. The key to both of these is Reichenbach’s emphasis on tokens in his analysis.

Reichenbach calls indexical expressions “token-reflexives”. The reason for this is clear on even an informal statement of Reichenbach’s view: the indexical “I” means “the person who utters this token”, “here” means “the place at which this token is uttered”, “now” means “the time at which this token is uttered”, and so forth. Token-reflexive expressions are thus expressions whose meaning is in some way keyed to individual tokens of them. (Though Reichenbach’s official theory is stated in terms of types and tokens, some passages in Reichenbach’s Elements of Symbolic Logic suggest that he was thinking of utterances rather than tokens. Contemporary defenders of Reichenbach-inspired views adopt this variation—see section 7a and García-Carpintero.)

Even on this informal statement, Reichenbach’s view clarifies to some degree the role of “this” in Russell’s analysis of egocentric particulars: a particular utterance of an indexical must refer to a token. Yet without further elaboration, this statement of Reichenbach’s view would be subject to the same problem as Russell’s, because it is undetermined which token is supposed to be referred to. If I utter “I am the person who uttered this token”, while pointing at a token of a sentence that someone else wrote on a chalkboard, then I have said something false.

This worry is allayed by a closer examination of the details of Reichenbach’s analysis. Suppose that Bertrand Russell utters (2):

(2) I am a philosopher.

In so doing, Russell has produced a token of “I”. Call this token t₁. Then on a more careful statement of Reichenbach’s view, Russell’s utterance of (2) means the same thing as (3):

(3) The person who utters t₁ is a philosopher.

Since Russell is the person who utters t₁, and Russell is a philosopher, Russell’s utterance is true. This shows that our rough translation of “I” above as “the person who utters this token” was incomplete. It is more correct (though on Reichenbach’s view, still not strictly correct—see below) to say that the meaning of “I” is such that any token t of “I” refers to t itself. Thus unlike Russell, who reduced all indexicals—Russell’s egocentric particulars—to the demonstrative pronoun “this”, Reichenbach reduces all indexicals—Reichenbach’s token-reflexives—to a very special kind of token-reflexive operation.

The token-reflexive operation that forms the basis of Reichenbach’s analysis is the special technical device of “token-quotes”—the pair of arrows “^↓” and “^↓” that Reichenbach introduces in his analysis of the phrase “this token”. For Reichenbach, the result of enclosing a token in token-quotes, as in

^↓a^↓,

produces a token that refers to the token of “a” enclosed in the quotes. The emphasis on “token” in the previous sentence is important, because the token below refers to a different token of “a”:

^↓a^↓.

Call these “token-quote phrases”. The above examples show that on Reichenbach’s view, no two tokens of a token-quote phrase can refer to the same thing. As a result, we cannot talk about the meaning of a token-quote phrase, because there is no meaning that any two tokens of the phrase share. For this reason, Reichenbach calls token-quote phrases “pseudo-phrases”. Since token-quote phrases are the foundation of Reichenbach’s analysis of indexicals, all indexicals are similarly pseudo-phrases. As a result, it is strictly speaking incorrect, on Reichenbach’s view, to talk about the meaning of an indexical.

One consequence of this view is that different utterances of (2), even by the same person, will strictly speaking mean different things. Suppose that Russell utters (2) a second time. In doing so, Russell has produced a separate token of “I”. Call this token t₂. On Reichenbach’s view, Russell’s second utterance of (2) means the same thing as (4):

(4) The person who utters t₂ is a philosopher.

This consequence of Reichenbach’s view is counter to our intuitions about the use of (2): if Russell uses (2) twice, Russell has said the same thing about himself. On Reichenbach’s view, Russell said two different things about two different tokens of “I”. Yet because in both cases, it was Russell who did the uttering, the truth of what Russell said in each case turns on whether Russell a philosopher. Thus, Reichenbach’s analysis gets the right truth conditions for an utterance of (2), but at the expense of certain intuitions about the meaning of “I”.

Reichenbach’s view has a further odd consequence, noted by David Kaplan. Suppose that I utter (5), and let “t₃” name the token of “I” that I have produced in so doing:

(5) If no one were to utter t₃, then I would not exist.

According to Reichenbach’s analysis, my utterance of (5) means the same thing as (6):

(6) If no one were to utter t₃, then the person who utters t₃ would not exist.

But (6) is plausibly a logical truth. Thus on Reichenbach’s view, my utterance of (5) is true as a matter of logic. Yet my utterance of (5) is clearly false: had I not uttered (5), I would nonetheless have continued to exist.

d. Burks on Indexical Symbols

In the article “Icon, Index, and Symbol”, Arthur Burks develops Peirce’s suggestive remarks about indexical words into a more systematic theory of their meanings. Burks’s theory also addresses some of the odd consequences of Reichenbach’s theory noted above (though it is unclear whether Burks was familiar with Reichenbach’s view). Thus, Burks’s theory represents a culmination of several different strands of thought concerning indexicals prior to Kaplan’s work.

On Burks’s theory, all expression types of a given language have what Burks calls symbolic meaning. This is the meaning of the expression type determined by the conventions governing the language. All tokens of a given expression type share the symbolic meaning of the type. The difference between indexical expressions and non-indexical expressions is in the meanings of individual tokens. For non-indexical expressions, the meaning of an individual token just is the symbolic meaning of the type of which it is a token. For indexical expressions, in contrast, the symbolic meaning of the expression type is only part of the meaning of each individual token of that type. The full meaning of a token of an indexical expression includes information about the token itself—where and when it exists, who produced it, and so forth. Burks calls this full meaning of a token of an indexical expression the indexical meaning of the token. So different tokens of an indexical expression differ in indexical meaning, but their different indexical meanings all have the symbolic meaning of the indexical expression in common.

For Burks, the indexical meaning of a token is what someone must know about that token in order to determine what that token represents. On Burks’s view, the indexical meaning of a token of an indexical expression comprises all of the following:

(i) the spatiotemporal location of the token;

(ii) a description of the object that the token represents; and

(iii) a set of what Burks calls “directions” that relate the token to the object it represents.

The directions in (iii) can arise in two different ways, either (a) as encoded in the symbolic meaning of the type of which the token is an instance, or (b) as determined by an act of pointing, or some similar gesture on the part of the person who produces or uses the token. Elements (ii) and (iiia) of the indexical meaning of a token are supplied by the symbolic meaning of the type of which the token is an instance. These will be shared by all tokens of the same type of indexical expression. Elements (i) and (iiib) are supplied by an individual’s knowledge of the token and its production or use. These will vary from one token to another.

Though Burks does not examine the question in detail, it appears that the importance of the individual elements of (i-iii) can vary from one indexical to another. For example, in the case of an utterance of the indexical “I”. someone may fully understand the utterance without knowing the spatiotemporal location of the utterance. (Suppose, for example, you get a phone call from a friend, but you have no idea where your friend is calling from, or that you hear a call of “Help me!” from a voice you recognize, but you cannot tell where the call is coming from.) On Burks’s view, then, it follows that one can understand an utterance of “I” without fully grasping its indexical meaning.

Burks’s suggestion that a complete semantic theory of indexical expressions may require appeal to two distinct kinds of meaning is important. As we see later, David Kaplan’s influential theory of indexicals develops a related suggestion in a systematic way.

e. Objections to Utterance-based Theories

The theories of Reichenbach and Burks (and probably Russell as well) are clear cases of what was called, in the introduction to this section, utterance-based semantic theories of indexicals. There are two influential objections to utterance-based theories. The presentation of the objections will focus on Reichenbach’s theory, because the technical details of Reichenbach’s theory are worked out to a sufficient degree that the force of the objections is most easy to see.

One important objection to utterance-based theories generally is due to David Kaplan. According to Kaplan, utterance-based theories do not provide adequate resources to explain the logical properties of indexicals and demonstratives. According to Kaplan, an adequate semantics for indexicals should explain the logical truth of a sentence like (7):

(7) If today is Monday, then today is Monday.

Yet given an utterance-based semantics, it is unclear how to do so. On Reichenbach’s analysis of indexicals, let u be some utterance of (7), and let t₁ and t₂ be the two tokens of “today” produced (or used) in u. According to Reichenbach, the truth conditions for u are given by (8):

(8) If the day on which t₁ is produced is Monday, then the day on which t₂ is produced is Monday.

Not only is (8) not logically true, it could even be false. Suppose that u were performed right around midnight, slowly enough that t₁ was produced at 11:59 PM on Monday, and t₂ at 12:01 AM on Tuesday. In this case, (8) is false. The same problem arises for the argument

(9) Today is Monday; therefore, today is Monday.

This looks like it should be a valid argument—it appears to have the form p; therefore p. Yet there are utterances of it on which the utterance of the premise is true, while the utterance of the conclusion is false.

A separate problem for utterance-based theories is that a semantic theory for a language should provide an interpretation of every sentence of the language. Yet on utterance-based theories such as Reichenbach’s, sentences containing indexicals receive an interpretation only upon being uttered. In the absence of an utterance of a sentence, Reichenbach’s theory offers no interpretation of it. Given the recursive structure of language, there are sentences that are too long to be uttered by any individual, and hence sentences that never receive any interpretation on Reichenbach’s theory. (For a discussion of and response to both of these objections to utterance-based theories of indexicals, see García-Carpintero.)

3. Kaplan’s Semantic Theory of Indexicals

We now turn to Kaplan’s influential theory of indexicals. Unlike the theories introduced in the previous section, Kaplan’s is an expression-based semantic theory. Kaplan does not take the objects of semantic evaluation to be utterances or tokens. Rather, Kaplan considers the expressions (types) themselves relative to contexts. On Kaplan’s theory, contexts are abstract formal structures that represent certain features of an utterance. As a result, the objects of semantic evaluation on Kaplan’s theory are abstract objects—expressions relative to contexts—rather than concrete physical objects (tokens) or particular events (utterances).

When discussing Kaplan’s theory, one must be careful: there are two different theories attributed to Kaplan on the basis of what he says in “Demonstratives”. We begin by introducing one of these theories. In section 5, when we discuss Kaplan’s logic of demonstratives, we introduce the other theory, and give reasons to prefer the first theory. It is this first theory that we refer to as “Kaplan’s (semantic) theory”.

a. Background and a Basic Insight

Kaplan’s semantic theory of indexicals is embedded in a general picture of the nature of meaning. In order to understand the significance of Kaplan’s theory, it is important to grasp this picture. According to this picture, the meaning of a sentence S—in the sense of the information encoded by S—is a complex, structured entity whose constituents are the meanings of the sub-sentential expressions (words and phrases) that occur in S, and whose structure is determined by the structure of S. This structured entity is called the proposition expressed by S. It is common to represent structured propositions using ordered n-tuples. For example, the sentence “Tally is a dog” expresses the proposition that we can represent using the ordered pair below:

〈BEING A DOG, Tally〉

(It is convenient to talk about ordered pairs, or more generally ordered n-tuples, like this one as being the proposition expressed by “Tally is a dog”, and we will follow this practice. It is important to keep in mind, however, that this is merely a convenience: strictly speaking, a structured proposition is not an n-tuple, and the n-tuple merely represents or stands for the proposition.) The constituents of this proposition are Tally and the property of being a dog. These are the meanings of the significant constituents of the sentence “Tally is a dog”: Tally is the meaning (or referent) of “Tally”, and the property of being a dog is the meaning of the predicate “is a dog”. The structure of the proposition reflects the fact that the sentence “Tally is a dog” is the result of putting the name “Tally” together with the predicate “is a dog”. The sentence “Lassie is a dog” would express a different proposition:

〈BEING A DOG, Lassie〉

It is common to refer to these propositions using the complex “that”-clauses “that Tally is a dog” and “that Lassie is a dog”. respectively. (The “that” in these clauses is not a demonstrative pronoun; it is what linguists call a “complementizer”.)

This picture of propositions as complex structured entities that contain objects and properties as constituents is due originally to Bertrand Russell, from his Principles of Mathematics, and it is currently a subject of significant controversy in the philosophy of language. Kaplan’s semantic theory of indexicals is one of the primary reasons many philosophers today embrace this Russellian picture of propositions.

Kaplan’s main contributions to the semantics of indexicals are (i) the recognition of a distinct kind of meaning, clearest in the case of indexicals like “I”, and (ii) a formal theory that explains how the different kinds of meaning are related to each other and to logic, linguistic competence, and language use. To understand Kaplan’s basic insight, consider two utterances of (10), one utterance by Barack Obama, and the other by Hilary Clinton:

(10) I am flying.

Two observations are immediate here: (i) Obama and Clinton have said or asserted different things—Obama has said of himself that he is flying, while Clinton has said of herself that she is flying—and (ii) the sentence that both Obama and Clinton have uttered means the same thing in both cases. Furthermore, these two observations are related: it is because (10) means what it does, and means the same thing when Obama utters it as it does when Clinton utters it, that Obama and Clinton can each use (10) to say different things.

The traditional notion of a proposition, as captured in the Russellian picture of propositions sketched above, applies to what is said or asserted. On this picture, Obama and Clinton have said or asserted different propositions. So the Russellian picture by itself does not offer any account of the meaning of (10) that remains constant across its different uses. This is where Kaplan’s first contribution comes in.

b. Character, Context, and Content

Kaplan calls the meaning of an expression that stays constant across different contexts of use its character. In Kaplan’s theory, character plays two fundamental roles: (i) the character of “I” is what a competent speaker of English knows in virtue of being competent with “I”; and (ii) the character of an expression is a rule or function whose arguments are contexts, and whose value for any context is what Kaplan calls the content of the expression relative to the context.

The character of “I”, for example, is a function whose value, for any context c, is what Kaplan calls the agent (c_A) of c (the speaker or writer of the context). The agent c_A of a context c is thus the content of “I” relative to c. A language user who is competent with “I” knows this rule, and it is this knowledge, together with information about a context, that allows a language user to figure out who “I” refers to relative to the context.

Generalizing from this example, we arrive at the following theory of meaning: character and content are two different kinds of meaning had by expressions of a language. In virtue of its character, each expression has a content relative to a context. Different kinds of expressions are assigned different kinds of contents relative to contexts. The content of a singular term like “I” relative to a context is an object or individual. The content of an n-place predicate relative to a context is an n-place property or relation. The content of a sentence relative to a context is a structured, Russellian proposition, whose constituents are the contents, relative to the same context, of the atomic expressions (words or phrases) occurring in the sentence.

Some expressions have a character that yields the same content relative to every context. The character of “Barack Obama”. for example, determines the same individual—Barack Obama—relative to every context. Other expressions have a character that yields different contents relative to different contexts. This is the characteristic feature of indexicals, and it is inherited by any expression that contains an indexical. Thus, we may talk not only about the indexicals “I”, “now” and “here”. but also about indexical phrases and sentences. An example of an indexical sentence is (10) (repeated).

(10) I am flying.

In virtue of the character of (10), the content of (10) relative to a context in which Barack Obama is the agent is the structured proposition

〈FLYING, Barack Obama〉,

yet relative to a context in which Hilary Clinton is the agent, the content of (10) is the structured proposition

〈FLYING, Hilary Clinton〉.

These propositions differ in what is contributed, relative to the different contexts, by the indexical “I”. The content of “I” relative to the first context is Barack Obama; the content of “I” relative to the second context is Hilary Clinton.

In addition to an agent c_A to serve as the content of “I”, each context c of Kaplan’s theory includes a time c_T to serve as the content of “now”, a location c_P to serve as the content of “here”, and a possible world c_W to serve as the content of “actually”. Thus, the sentence “I am located here”, relative to a context c, expresses the structured proposition

〈BEING LOCATED AT, 〈c_A, c_P〉〉.

In this case, BEING LOCATED AT is a two-place relation between objects or individuals and locations, and the proposition predicates this relation of the agent and location of the context c. This captures the clear intuition that a speaker who utters “I am located here” says of himself or herself that he or she is at the location of the utterance. Additional parameters may be added to contexts as needed by different indexicals (see the discussion of true demonstratives in section 4), but Kaplan’s original theory focuses on the four above. Thus for most purposes, each context c of Kaplan’s theory can be identified with the quadruple 〈c_A, c_P, c_T, c_W〉.

c. Truth Relative to a Context

Kaplan’s theory also provides the resources for defining truth (and falsehood) for sentences relative to contexts. The underlying, natural idea is that if Saul Kripke utters (11), the sentence, as Saul Kripke has used it, is true in virtue of two facts: (i) relative to the context of Kripke’s use (in which Kripke is the agent), (11) expresses the proposition that Saul Kripke is a philosopher, and (ii) Saul Kripke is a philosopher:

(11) I am a philosopher.

In other words, (11), as Saul Kripke has used it, expresses a proposition that is true at the world in which Saul Kripke has used it (in this case, the actual world).

(To say that a proposition p is true (or false) at a possible world w is just to say that p would be true (false) were w actual. For example, let w be a possible world in which Barack Obama lost to Mitt Romney in the November 2012 presidential election. The proposition that in 2014, Barack Obama is president is false at w, because if w were actual, Barack Obama would not be president.)

Kaplan’s definition of truth (falsehood) for a sentence relative to a context develops this natural idea as follows: a sentence S is true (false) relative to a context c if and only if the content of S relative to c (the proposition expressed by S relative to c) is true (false) at the world c_W of c. Thus, the sentence “I am Saul Kripke” is true relative to any context in which Saul Kripke is the agent, but false relative to any context in which Saul Kripke is not the agent.

There are two features of Kaplan’s definition of truth relative to a context worthy of further attention. The first is that sentences have truth values relative to contexts and worlds. This observation is more general than the definition of truth relative to a context. Given any context c and world w, we can assign a truth value to a sentence S relative to c and w: it is just the truth value at w of the proposition expressed by S relative to c. Because each context c uniquely determines a world c_W (the world of the context), there are two distinct possible world parameters relevant to assigning a truth value to a sentence S—the world c_W of the context c relative to which S expresses a proposition, and the world w at which we evaluate the proposition expressed by S relative to c. This is an example of double indexing, which was recognized before Kaplan’s work as necessary for the treatment of indexicals. (For an early and influential discussion of double indexing for the indexical “now”, see Kamp.)

Double indexing applies not only to sentences but to singular terms and predicates as well. Just as a sentence is assigned a truth value relative to a context and a possible world, so a singular term (either a proper name or a definite description) is assigned a denotation relative to a context and a possible world, and an n-place predicate is assigned an extension (a set of n-tuples) relative to a context and possible world.

The second important feature of Kaplan’s definition of truth relative to a context is that the second possible world parameter is the world of the context. Again, if we focus just on the possible world parameter of a context, this means that the world c_W of the context c is playing two roles in the definition of truth relative to a context c: in one role, it represents the world at which a sentence is uttered or used, and relative to which the sentence expresses a proposition. In the other role, it represents the (actual or counterfactual) circumstance relative to which we evaluate the proposition expressed. This was implicit already in the intuitive statement above of the underlying idea that Kaplan’s definition seeks to capture: (11), as Saul Kripke has used it in the world in which he has used it, expresses a proposition that is true at the world in which he has used it. The two occurrences in the previous sentence of the phrase “the world in which he has used it” reflect the two roles played by the world c_W of the context c in Kaplan’s formal definition of truth relative to c.

One of Kaplan’s most significant philosophical insights was to recognize the difference between these two roles. To help keep these distinct roles clear, Kaplan introduced the phrase circumstance of evaluation to refer to the second role played by the world parameter in the definition of truth for a sentence relative to a context. This allows us to restate Kaplan’s definition as follows: a sentence S is true relative to a context c if and only if the content of S relative to c (the proposition expressed by S relative to c) is true at the circumstance of evaluation c_W determined by c.

(The circumstance of evaluation in Kaplan’s formal definition includes the time c_T of the context as well, but this (i) raises questions about the metaphysics of propositions that are better addressed elsewhere, and (ii) would make the ensuing discussion more complicated without compensatory benefits.)

Again, this feature of Kaplan’s definition of truth relative to a context generalizes to singular terms and predicates. A singular term t denotes an object o relative to a context c and circumstance of evaluation c_W determined by c, if and only if t denotes o relative to c full stop. An n-place predicate P_n has an extension E relative to c if and only if E is the extension of P_n relative to c and the circumstance of evaluation c_W determined by c.

d. Indexicality and Modality

The importance of the distinction between context and circumstance of evaluation is particularly clear when we consider sentences containing both indexicals and modal operators like “necessarily” or “possibly”. On the standard semantic treatment of the modal operators, sentences are true or false only relative to a possible world. A sentence like (12) is true relative to, or at, a world w if and only if there is a possible world w* (accessible from w) such that (13) is true at w*:

(12) Possibly, Barack Obama is president.

(13) Barack Obama is president.

The modal operator “possibly” in (12) serves to shift the possible world parameter of evaluation: the truth of (12) at a world w depends on the truth of (13) at some other world w*. (Strictly, w* could be identical with w, but it need not be.)

When we turn to indexical sentences, however, there are two possible world parameters relative to which such sentences are true or false: the world of the context and the circumstance of evaluation. Which parameter does the modal operator shift?

One way to approach this question is to ask what we mean when we say that a sentence S is true at a possible world w. One thing we could mean by this is that if one were to utter S in w, then one would say something true. On this account, to say that S is true at all possible worlds is to say that no matter what world one was in, if one uttered S in that world, one would say something true. But this is highly implausible. If Robby the Ranger utters (14) in this world, then Robby says something true, because “Yellow-Yellow” refers to a notorious bear that lived in the Adirondacks in the early 2000s:

(14) If Yellow-Yellow exists, then Yellow-Yellow is a bear.

But in another possible world, the name “Yellow-Yellow” might refer to a raccoon. So were Robby to utter (14) in this other possible world, what Robby said would be false. Thus on this view, (14) is not true at every possible world, and hence (15) is false:

(15) Necessarily, if Yellow-Yellow exists, then Yellow-Yellow is a bear.

But most philosophers, persuaded by Kripke, would reject this conclusion: if Yellow-Yellow was a bear, then she was essentially a bear. (See Kripke for a defense of the existence of essential properties.)

There is an alternative interpretation of what we mean when we say that a sentence S is true at a possible world w. On this interpretation, we consider what S says in the actual world (or what someone who uttered S would strictly and literally say), and we evaluate what S says for truth or falsehood at w. More carefully: a sentence S is true at world w if and only if the proposition actually expressed by S is true at w. On this interpretation, then, evaluating “Necessarily, S” requires first determining the proposition actually expressed by S, and then evaluating this proposition at every possible world. This yields the intuitively correct result for the sentence “Necessarily, if Yellow-Yellow exists, then Yellow-Yellow is a bear”. This is true if and only if the proposition actually expressed by “If Yellow-Yellow exists, then Yellow-Yellow is a bear” is true at every possible world. But this proposition is vacuously true at worlds where Yellow-Yellow does not exist, and if Kripke is correct that Yellow-Yellow is essentially a bear, then this proposition is also true at every world where Yellow-Yellow does exist.

As we saw in our discussion of Kaplan’s definition of truth relative to a context, the role of the circumstance of evaluation is to be the world relative to which the proposition expressed by S relative to a context is evaluated. Thus, the intuitive reflections on what we mean when we say that a sentence S is true at a world suggest a clear answer to the question from two paragraphs back: modal operators like “necessarily” and “possibly” shift the circumstance of evaluation, not the world of the context.

This answer garners further support from our intuitions about sentences containing “actually”. Because “actually” is an indexical, its interpretation relative to a context c is determined by the parameters of the context. In the case of “actually”, the relevant parameter is the world c_W of the context. Thus, if modal operators shifted the world of the context, then they would shift the interpretation of the modal indexical “actually”, but intuitively they do not. Kaplan’s famous example of this is (16):

(16) It is possible that in Pakistan, in five years, only those who are actually here now are envied.

In this sentence, “actually” is within the scope of “it is possible that”. So if “it is possible that” shifts the world of the context, then the value of “actually” would be shifted. But it is not. Suppose Kaplan utters both (16) and (17):

(17) Only those who are actually here now are envied.

It is clear that in both cases, Kaplan’s use of “actually” picks out the same world—the world in which he performs both utterances. The only alternative is that the modal operators “possibly” and “necessarily” shift the circumstance of evaluation. More precisely, for any context c and possible world w,

[Necessarily ϕ] is true relative to a context c and world w if and only if, for every possible world w* (accessible from w), ϕ is true relative to c and w*.

One of Kaplan’s central theses about indexicals in English is that there can be no operator that shifts contexts or parameters of contexts in the way that an operator like “necessarily” shifts the circumstance of evaluation. Kaplan calls such operators monsters. The claim that natural language does not include monsters is a matter of debate in current philosophy and linguistics. (For a sophisticated discussion of monsters in linguistics, see Schlenker.)

There is one final observation worth noting before we leave this section: it is important to recognize that “actually” is both an indexical, receiving a value from the context, and a modal operator. As a modal operator, “actually” serves to shift the circumstance of evaluation in the definition of truth relative to a context. But unlike “necessarily” or “possibly”, “actually” always shifts the circumstance of evaluation to the world of the context. Thus on Kaplan’s theory, for any context c and any possible world w, the rule for “actually” is as follows:

[Actually ϕ] is true relative to c and w if and only if ϕ is true relative to c and c_W.

One consequence of this rule is that for any context c and sentence S, if S is true relative to c, then so are both “Actually S” and “Necessarily actually S”. (For more discussion of this consequence, see section 5.)

e. Some Consequences of Kaplan’s Theory of Indexicals

There are several consequences of Kaplan’s theory, as laid out thus far, worth noting:

Indexical singular terms like “I” are directly referential.

A singular term is directly referential if and only if its semantic content relative to a context—what it contributes to the propositions expressed in that context by the sentences in which it occurs—is just the object or individual to which it refers. Thus, it is an immediate consequence of Kaplan’s theory that “I” is directly referential, since the semantic content of an indexical singular term like “I” relative to a context is just the agent of the context. Relative to a context, “I” directly refers to the agent of the context.

The thesis that there are directly referential singular terms is in stark contrast to the Fregean view of language, according to which the content of an expression is always a sense—a mode of presentation of an object, property, or proposition.

Indexical singular terms are rigid designators.

The concept of a rigid designator was introduced into philosophical and semantic discussions by Saul Kripke. According to Kripke, an expression e rigidly designates an object o if and only if e designates o in every possible world in which o exists, and does not designate anything else in any world in which o does not exist. To apply the concept of rigid designation to indexical singular terms, however, we need a definition of rigid designation relative to a context. The following definition is somewhat technical, but it correctly captures Kripke’s notion within a semantics for indexical expressions:

Rigid Designation Relative to a Context:

An expression e rigidly designates an object o relative to a context c if and only if for every possible world w, any predicate F, and any object x distinct from o, if o exists at w, then the proposition expressed relative to c by [e is F] is true at w if and only if, in w, o has the property expressed by F relative to c, and if o does not exist at w it is not the case that the proposition expressed by [e is F] is true at w if and only if, in w, x has the property expressed by F relative to c.

The indexical singular term “I”, for example, is a rigid designator relative to any context c according to this definition. Relative to c, the sentence [I am F] expresses the proposition

〈F-hood, c_A〉.

This proposition is true at an arbitrary world w if and only if c_A has the property F-hood in w. Thus relative to c, “I” rigidly designates c_A.

Note that in the above example, we do not have to specify whether c_A exists at w. This shows that directly referential terms are rigid designators in a particularly strong sense. A directly referential term designates the same object in all possible worlds, whether the object exists at that world or not. (Nathan Salmon, in Reference and Essence, calls such terms obstinately rigid designators.) This is because a directly referential expression contributes the object that it designates to the propositions expressed by sentences in which it occurs; the object is a constituent of the proposition. Any such proposition—one that contains an object or individual as a constituent—is called a singular proposition. Speaking loosely, when we evaluate a singular proposition for truth or falsehood at a possible world w, the singular proposition “brings along” with it the objects that are its constituents. Thus, directly referential terms automatically rigidly designate the objects or individuals to which they refer.

For any definite description [the x: Fx] that uniquely designates an object o relative to a context c, the definite description [the x: Actually Fx] rigidly designates o relative to c.

This consequence of Kaplan’s theory is a corollary of the observations about “actually” at the end of the previous section. Relative to any context c and possible world w, [the x: actually Fx] designates the unique object o that “is F” in the world c_W of c, if o exists in w. This is because of the effect of “actually”, which shifts the circumstance of evaluation to the world of the context. Thus, if [the x: Fx] designates o relative to c, [the x: actually Fx] designates o, relative to c, in every world w in which o exists, and does not designate anything else in any world w in which o does not exist.

This consequence of Kaplan’s theory is significant for one of the classic debates in the philosophy of language: the debate over the meaning of proper names. Ever since Saul Kripke’s Naming and Necessity, philosophers and linguists have recognized that proper names, such as “David Kaplan”, in natural languages such as English are rigid designators. Kripke and others take this semantic feature of proper names to be a major objection to the analysis, inspired by Frege and Russell, of proper names as definite descriptions (in Fregean terms, a definite description gives the sense of a proper name). Suppose we analyze the name “David Kaplan” as the definite description “the author of the most important work on indexicals and demonstratives in the 20th century”. Then in some possible world in which Wittgenstein wrote the most important work on indexicals and demonstratives in the 20th century, the name “David Kaplan” would designate Wittgenstein. Thus on this proposal, the name “David Kaplan” is not a rigid designator.

Some philosophers, however, have responded by modifying the Frege-Russell view: if proper names are analyzed as definite descriptions that have been rigidified by adding “actually”, then Kripke’s observation that proper names are rigid designators is just what we would expect. Other philosophers in turn have rejected this modification on various grounds. (For discussion, see chapter 2 of Soames, Beyond Rigidity.)

4. True Demonstratives

So far, we have discussed Kaplan’s semantic theory of pure indexicals—those expressions whose content is uniquely determined relative to a context by basic features of the context (like the agent, time, location, and world). As we noted in the introduction, however, there are also context-sensitive expressions for which these basic features of context are not sufficient to uniquely determine a content relative to a context. These are the true demonstratives. The paradigm examples are the singular demonstrative pronouns “this” and “that”. Except toward the end of this section, I will focus exclusively on “that”.

a. Two Challenges Posed by True Demonstratives

There are several challenges in spelling out a formal theory of true demonstratives. Two of the most important are (i) how to account, in the theory, for the role of whatever is required in a context (gestures, intentions, and so forth) to fix the reference of a particular use of a demonstrative, and (ii) that distinct occurrences of the same true demonstrative can differ in content relative to the same context.

These challenges are related: on an intuitive level, it is because true demonstratives require some further supplementation from the context that distinct occurrences of the same demonstrative can refer to different things. If I point first at the Washington Monument, and then at the Capitol Building while I utter (18), I have said that the Washington Monument is taller than the Capitol Building, and I have done so because there is something in the context that fixes the reference of my first use of “that” as the Washington Monument, and something in the context that fixes the reference of my second use of “that” as the Capitol Building:

(18) That is taller than that.

These observations about true demonstratives pose a problem for Kaplan’s theory as we have stated it thus far: if the meaning of a demonstrative is its character, and the character of an expression is a function that returns the same content whenever applied to the same context, then there is no way for distinct occurrences of a true demonstrative to differ in content relative to the same context. Any attempt to accommodate true demonstratives into Kaplan’s theory must address this problem.

b. Reference Fixing for True Demonstratives

In order to address the first of the two challenges above posed by true demonstratives—that of how to incorporate into the formal theory whatever is required to fix the reference of a particular use of a demonstrative—we must first determine what in fact fixes the reference of a use of demonstrative. There are many different theories, but most fall into one of two categories: the reference of a particular use of a demonstrative is fixed (i) by an associated gesture, or (ii) by an associated intention.

In “Demonstratives,” Kaplan defends a theory of the first kind. For Kaplan, a demonstration is the way that an object that has been singled out in some way (often, but not always, by an act of pointing) appears or is represented from a particular perspective. Kaplan calls this theory the Fregean Theory of Demonstrations. On the Fregean theory, demonstrations have three qualities in virtue of which they closely resemble (pure) indexical definite descriptions: (i) a demonstration determines a mode of presentation of an object (so that different demonstrations may be demonstrations of the same object), (ii) a particular demonstration d might have picked out a different object from the object that it in fact picks out, and (iii) a particular demonstration d might pick out no object at all (in the case of an illusion or hallucination, for example). The Fregean Theory of Demonstrations provides a natural account of the example above, in which I point at the Washington Monument and at the Capitol Building. In the example, the Washington Monument is singled out visually by my first pointing gesture as the object that I am referring to with my first use of “that”, and the Capitol is singled out visually by my second pointing gesture as the object that I am referring to with my second use of “that”.

One virtue of the Fregean Theory of Demonstrations is that it provides an account of why certain uses of demonstratives are informative, while others are not. This is illustrated by a famous example due to John Perry (in his influential article “Frege on Demonstratives”): suppose that we can see both the bow and stern of the aircraft carrier USS Enterprise in harbor, but the middle of the ship is hidden behind a tall building. Now suppose that I point first at the bow, and then at the stern, while uttering (19):

(19) That is identical to that.

My utterance is informative. But suppose instead I had pointed twice at the bow while uttering (19). My utterance in this case would not be informative. According to the Fregean Theory of Demonstrations, the demonstrations in my second utterance present the USS Enterprise in the same way, yet my demonstrations in my first utterance present the USS Enterprise in two different ways. It may be informative to be told that the object presented in one way is identical to the object presented in another way, but it is not informative to be told that the object presented in one way is identical to the object presented that same way. (Observations like this provide one way that Kaplan can respond to the criticisms discussed below in section 6a.)

One problem with gesture-based views generally is that there are uses of demonstratives that are not associated with any gestures at all. Upon seeing a bright flash through the window, I might ask my wife, “what was that?” without needing to perform any gesture at all. If I perform no gesture, then on any theory according to which the reference of my use of “that” is fixed by my gesture, my use of “that” in this example will not refer to anything. This is the wrong result: my use of “that” clearly refers to the bright flash.

This problem with gesture-based views suggests that an intention-based view is superior. But it is important in proposing or defending an intention-based view that one specifies precisely which intention one thinks is significant for fixing the reference of a use of a demonstrative. A speaker who uses a demonstrative may have several intentions: to point at a particular object o, to refer to o, to refer to the object at which he or she is pointing, and so forth. There may be cases in which these intentions do not single out the same object. For example, I may intend both (i) to refer to an object o, and (ii) to refer to the object at which I am pointing. But if I am in fact pointing at some object o* distinct from o, then these two intentions will determine distinct objects.

Philosophers who argue about different theories of reference-fixing for demonstratives often use such cases as data: suppose theory A says that the reference of a use of a demonstrative is fixed by the speaker’s intention α, and theory B says that the reference of a use of a demonstrative is fixed by the speaker’s intention β. Suppose further that there is some case in which a speaker uses “that,” and in which the speaker’s intention α uniquely determines an object o₁, and the speaker’s intention β uniquely determines an object o₂. Finally, suppose that it is clear in the case in question that the speaker has succeeded in referring with her use of “that” to o₂. This is evidence in favor of theory B over theory A.

In his later essay “Afterthoughts,” Kaplan rejects the Fregean Theory of Demonstrations in favor of a view according to which the reference of a use of a demonstrative is fixed not by a pointing gesture, but by the intention that directs the pointing gesture. Kaplan calls these directing intentions. Thus while on the later Kaplan’s view, the reference of a use of a demonstrative is fixed by an intention, that intention is still associated in some way with a speaker’s gestures: if one chooses not to perform a gesture, then one has no intention to direct a gesture at any individual. As a result, it is unclear whether this view successfully avoids one of the central problems with gesture-based views.

Other intention-based accounts may avoid this problem. According to Kent Bach, for example, the reference of a speaker’s use of “that” is the object determined by the speaker’s referential intention. On Bach’s view, a referential intention has a special reflexive structure: a speaker intends the audience to identify, and to take themselves to be intended to identify, some object or individual as the object the speaker is referring to by thinking of that object in a particular way. If the speaker performs some kind of pointing gesture, then the speaker may intend for the audience to think of the object in question as the object that the speaker is pointing at. In other cases, however, the speaker may intend for the audience to think of the object in question in other ways. (Two classic papers in the debate over demonstrative reference fixing are Marga Reimer’s “Do Demonstrations have Semantic Significance?” and Kent Bach’s “Intentions and Demonstrations”.)

c. Adding True Demonstratives to Kaplan’s Theory

In “Demonstratives,” Kaplan considers two ways of adding demonstratives to his theory. The first requires adding an artificial word, “dthat” to the language, via the following rule: if α is a singular term or definite description, then ⌈dthat [α]⌉ is a singular term. Examples from English include “dthat [the current president of the United States]”, “dthat [Saul Kripke]”, and “dthat[the ice cream cone I ate today]”.

The semantics for “dthat” is such that relative to a context c, the content of ⌈dthat[α]⌉ is the object denoted by α relative to c. For example, relative to a context c such that c_W is the actual world and c_T is noon on January 31, 2013, the content of “dthat[the current president of the United States]” is Barack Obama, because at noon on January 31, 2013 in the actual world, Barack Obama was president. Thus, “dthat”-terms are directly referential, and hence also rigid designators.

“Dthat”-terms exploit the similarity noted above, in our discussion of the Fregean Theory of Demonstrations, between demonstrations and indexical definite descriptions. In this way, this treatment of demonstratives addresses the problem of multiple occurrences of demonstratives by avoiding it altogether. This is because, for Kaplan, an occurrence of a “dthat”-term corresponds to a use of a demonstrative together with a particular type of demonstration, where the singular term α in ⌈dthat[α]⌉ is playing the role of the demonstration. On this treatment of demonstratives, for example, my utterance of (18) (“that is taller than that”), pointing first at the Washington Monument, and then at the Capitol Building, would be represented by (20):

(20) Dthat[the object that appears thus-and-so from here] is taller than dthat[the object that appears so-and-thus from here].

In this case, the definite descriptions “the object that appears thus-and-so from here” and “the object that appears so-and-thus from here” represent my two demonstrations. Thus rather than having two occurrences of the same word or phrase, we have two different phrases altogether.

As a tool for investigating the semantics and logic of directly referential expressions, Kaplan’s “dthat” has been very influential. But as a basis for a semantic theory of the English demonstrative pronoun “that”, “dthat” is inadequate. The primary problem with using “dthat” as a model for the English demonstrative pronoun “that” is that we do not judge ourselves to have used two different phrases when we utter “that is taller than that” while pointing at two distinct objects. Yet if the English demonstrative pronoun “that” functioned like Kaplan’s “dthat”, we would have to say that each use of “that” in an utterance of “that is taller than that” is in fact an utterance of a distinct phrase that in some way combines the word “that” with either the pointing gestures performed or some particular intention. This runs counter to our clear intuition that we are using the same word twice to refer to different things. (See Salmon, “Demonstrating and Necessity”.)

The second way that Kaplan considers adding true demonstratives to his theory requires adding an infinite (or sufficiently large) number of distinct subscripted “that”s: “that₁”, “that₂”, and so forth. Each of these is treated as a distinct word in the language. Then we add to each context c an infinite (or sufficiently long) sequence c_D of objects and individuals. Each subscripted “that” is then assigned its own character: for each i, the content of “that_i” relative to a context c is the i-th member of the sequence c_D. We will call the members of c_D the demonstrata of c. For example, let c be the following context:

〈Saul Kripke, Washington DC, August 4^th, 2014, @ (the actual world), 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building,…〉〉

In other words, Saul Kripke is the agent c_A, Washington DC is the location c_P, August 4^th, 2014 is the time c_T, the actual world is the world c_W, and the sequence

〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building,…〉

is the sequence c_D of demonstrata of c. Relative to c, the sentence “that₁ is taller than that₂” expresses the structured proposition

〈TALLER-THAN, 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building〉〉.

This second treatment of demonstratives also avoids the problem of multiple occurrences, because in place of two occurrences of one demonstrative “that”, this theory has occurrences of two distinct terms: “that₁” and “that₂”. As a result, this theory is subject to an objection similar to that raised above to the treatment of demonstratives using “dthat”: it flies in the face of basic intuitions about the language. One apparently basic feature of English is that it contains a demonstrative pronoun “that” which can be used multiple times to refer to distinct objects. This is inconsistent with the claim that instead of a single demonstrative pronoun “that” there are infinitely many distinct subscripted pronouns “that₁”, “that₂”, and so forth.

d. David Braun’s Context-Shifting Semantics for True Demonstratives

(This section is more technical than the preceding.) An influential alternative to Kaplan’s two approaches to demonstratives is David Braun’s context-shifting theory of demonstratives. According to this theory, formal contexts include sequences of demonstrata (as on the second of Kaplan’s theories considered above), but formal contexts also include that Braun calls a focal demonstratum. The focal demonstratum of a context is simply one member of the sequence of demonstrata. An example of a formal context on Braun’s view would be

〈Saul Kripke, Washington DC, August 4^th, 2014, @, the Washington Monument, 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building,…〉〉.

This formal context differs from the example above only in that the Washington Monument occurs twice: once as a member of the sequence of demonstrata, and once as the focal demonstratum.

Braun then proposes that the meaning of a demonstrative “that” has two parts. One of these parts is its character. For Braun, the character of “that” is a function that for any context c returns the focal demonstratum of c. The second part of the meaning of “that” is a function that shifts the context in a systematic way: on Braun’s view, the result of applying this function to a context c whose focal demonstratum is the i-th member of the sequence of demonstrata is a context whose focal demonstratum is the i+1-th member of the sequence of demonstrata.

So on Braun’s view, the demonstrative “that” is associated with two functions, each of which applies to the formal contexts of the semantic theory, but which yield very different outputs. The character of “that”, which we can abbreviate as “ch_that”, is a function that when applied to a context returns a particular parameter of that context—the focal demonstratum. The shifting function of “that”, which we can abbreviate as “sh_that”, is a function that when applied to a context returns another context. Evaluating an occurrence of “that” relative to a context c thus involves two steps: in the first step, we apply the character ch_that of “that” to c, to yield the content of the occurrence; in the second step, we apply the shifting function to c, to yield a new context sh_that(c). The next occurrence of “that” (if there is one) is then evaluated relative to the new context sh_that(c).

Thus on Braun’s view, the proposition expressed by a sentence like (18) (reproduced below) relative to a context c is the proposition that follows it:

(18) That is taller than that

〈TALLER-THAN, 〈ch_that(c), ch_that(sh_that(c))〉〉

On this proposal, the content of the first occurrence of “that” in (18) relative to c is just ch_that(c)—the result of applying the character of “that” to c. The evaluation of the first occurrence of “that” in (18) then triggers the application of the shifting function. Thus the content of the second occurrence of “that” in (18) relative to c is ch_that(sh_that(c))—the result of applying the character of “that” to the context that results from applying the shifting function of “that” to c. The difference between a context c and sh_that(c) is just a difference in the focal demonstratum. But the character of “that” (ch_that) is a function that maps a context c to the focal demonstratum of c. Thus on Braun’s view, ch_that(c) is the focal demonstratum of c, and ch_that(sh_that(c)) is the focal demonstratum of sh_that(c). Thus on Braun’s view, the content of (18) relative to c is the proposition that predicates the relation TALLER-THAN of the focal demonstratum of c and the focal demonstratum of the result of applying the shifting function to c (in that order).

An example will help to clarify the significance of Braun’s view. Suppose that c is the context

〈Saul Kripke, Washington DC, August 4^th, 2014, @, the Washington Monument, 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building,…〉〉,

where the Washington Monument is the focal demonstratum. Then sh_that(c) is the context

〈Saul Kripke, Washington DC, August 4^th, 2014, @, the Capitol Building, 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building,…〉〉,

where the Capitol Building is the focal demonstratum. Now the proposition expressed by (18) relative to c is

〈TALLER-THAN, 〈the Washington Monument, the Capitol Building〉〉.

But (i) this is just the result that we want, and (ii) we have achieved this result without abandoning the idea that the meaning of an indexical or demonstrative is its character—a function from contexts to contents.

5. Kaplan’s Logic of Indexicals

In addition to the semantic theory for indexicals and demonstratives discussed above, Kaplan provides an account of the logical properties of indexicals. Kaplan’s logic has been just as influential as his semantic theory. Section 5a sketches the core idea of Kaplan’s logic in an informal way, and discusses two examples of logical truths in Kaplan’s system that have been the focus of some philosophical debate. Section 5b introduces the second semantic theory of indexicals attributed to Kaplan (see the introduction to section 3), and briefly discusses reasons most philosophers prefer the semantic theory introduced in section 3.

a. The Core Idea of Kaplan’s Logic

The core of Kaplan’s logic is the idea that a sentence containing indexicals is logically true if and only if the rules governing the meanings of its indexicals, plus the rules for the logical connectives, ensure that the sentence is true in every possible context, independently of the meanings of the non-logical expressions that occur in the sentence. A simple example is (21).

(21) If I am fond of dogs, then I am fond of dogs.

Since, in every context, the character of “I” will return the same individual in both places in the sentence where it occurs, the antecedent and consequent of (21) will have the same truth value in every context, and thus (21) will be true in every context.

A more interesting example is the sentence

(22) I am president if and only if, actually, I am president.

To see that this sentence is true in every context, let us try to construct a context relative to which it is false. In virtue of the semantics for “if and only if”, this would require some context c such that (23) is false relative to c, while (24) is true relative to c (or vice versa):

(23) I am president.

(24) Actually, I am president.

But reflection on the semantics for “Actually” shows that this cannot occur. If (24) is true relative to c, then (by the definition of truth relative to a context), the content of (24) relative to c is true at the circumstance c_W of c. Given the semantics for “Actually” (see section 3d), this is the case if and only if the content of (23) relative to c is true at the circumstance c_W of c. Since “Actually” shifts the circumstance of evaluation to the world of the context, it has no effect if the circumstance of evaluation already is the world of the context. But to say that the content of (23) relative to c is true at the circumstance c_W of c is just to say that (23) is true relative to c. Thus, (24) is true relative to c if and only if (23) is true relative to c, no matter what context we take c to be.

One reason for interest in this example is that while it is a logical truth, the sentence that results from prefacing it with the modal operator “Necessarily” is not a logical truth:

Necessarily (I am president if and only if, actually, I am president).

Relative to a context c, (25) is true if and only if for every world w, (22) is true relative to c and w (because “Necessarily” shifts the circumstance of evaluation). But (22) is true relative to c and w if and only if (23) and (24) are either both true or/and both false relative to c and w. Yet (24) is true relative to c and w if and only if (23) is true relative to c and c_W (because “Actually” shifts the circumstance of evaluation back to the world of the context). Thus the logical truth of (25) turns on the following claim about (23): that its content relative to any context c has the same truth value at every circumstance of evaluation. Let c be a context such that c_A is Barack Obama and c_W is the actual world, and let w be a world in which Barack Obama never ran for president. Then (23) is true relative to c (the content of (23) relative to c is true at the circumstance of evaluation c_W), but (23) is not true relative to c and w (because the content of (23) relative to c is not true at the circumstance of evaluation w).

This result has two related interesting consequences: (i) the rule of necessitation fails in Kaplan’s logic. Necessitation is a rule of inference stating that if ϕ is a theorem of a logical system, then so is “Necessarily ϕ”. Necessitation is a standard rule of inference in modal logic, so its failure in Kaplan’s logic of indexicals is surprising. (ii) There are logical truths in Kaplan’s logic that are not necessarily true. In other words, some logical truths in Kaplan’s logic are contingent.

The significance of the second of these consequences is a matter of debate. Kaplan suggests that examples like (22) are cases of contingent a priori claims: propositions that are knowable a priori but are merely contingent. Yet to argue directly from Kaplan’s example to this conclusion requires the further assumption that logical truths in Kaplan’s logic of indexicals express propositions that are knowable a priori. This is a very important topic in the contemporary philosophy of language. For more discussion, see Soames’ Reference and Description, especially Ch. 4.

Another controversial example of a logical truth in Kaplan’s logic is (26):

(26) I am here now.

Kaplan argues that a logic of indexicals should do justice to the intuition that (26) is, in his words, “universally true”. This is another example of a sentence that is not necessarily true, even if it is true. Wherever Saul Kripke is located, if he utters (26), he says something true, but if Kripke were to utter “It is a necessary truth that I am here now”, he would say something false. He could have been somewhere else.

Yet the status of (26) as a logical truth has proven controversial. The most common objection arises from considering various technologies that we use in communication. Early objections to Kaplan’s claim that (26) is a logical truth pointed to the use of sentences like (27) in recording messages for an answering machine:

(27) I am not here now.

Suppose an individual A records a message on an answering machine for their home phone that says “I am not here now. Please leave your name and phone number, and I will return your call as soon as I can”. Another individual B then calls A’s house when A is not at home, and the answering machine plays A’s recorded message. It does not seem as though there is anything false in A’s message. Yet if (26) is a logical truth, then (27) should be a logical falsehood. Thus, Kaplan’s claim that (26) is a logical truth seems to run afoul of everyday facts about language and communication. For an extended discussion of the significance of examples like this, see Predelli, Contexts.

b. Kaplan’s Other Semantic Theory

The model theory for Kaplan’s logic is a development of the model-theoretic semantics for modal logic introduced by Saul Kripke in the early 1960s. The key insight to Kripke’s semantics for modal logic was the introduction of possible worlds as indices relative to which expressions are assigned extensions (truth values in the case of formulas, objects in the case of singular terms, and sets of ordered n-tuples in the case of n-place predicates). In this framework, the intension of an expression is the function whose value for each possible world is the extension of the expression relative to that possible world. The intension of a sentence, for example, is a function from possible worlds to truth values, where for any world w, the value of the intension of s for the world w is the truth value of s relative to w.

This allows us to assign to each sentence s a set of possible worlds at which s is true. For many philosophers, this set is an obvious and natural candidate for the proposition expressed by s. Extending this idea to Kaplan’s logic, the proposal is that the content of an expression relative to a context is an intension, and hence the proposition expressed by a sentence ϕ relative to a context c (in a model M) is just the set of possible worlds w (and times t, in Kaplan’s formal system), such that

⊨^M_cftw ϕ.

Extending this idea further to Kaplan’s semantic theory for indexicals and demonstratives in English, the proposal is that the proposition expressed relative to a context in which Barack Obama is the agent by the sentence

(31) I am flying

is just the set of possible worlds at which it is true that Barack Obama is flying. Similarly, the intension of the singular term “I” relative to this context is the function whose value for any possible world w is just Barack Obama.

This alternative semantic theory is suggested by some of Kaplan’s remarks in “Demonstratives,” and it is the theory that emerges from the formal semantics for the language LD spelled out above. The difference between this alternative semantic theory and the semantic theory attributed to Kaplan in section 3 is the subject of a great deal of contemporary controversy. At issue is the nature of propositions and meaning: according to the theory attributed to Kaplan in section 3, the proposition expressed by a sentence relative to a context is a structured, complex entity that includes as constituents the meanings, relative to the same context, of the words occurring in the sentence. According to the alternative semantic theory sketched immediately above, the proposition expressed by a sentence relative to a context has no such structure or constituents. It is a set of possible worlds.

One reason to prefer the theory attributed to Kaplan in section 3 is that it is only on this theory that we can distinguish between singular terms that are directly referential, and singular terms that are rigid but not directly referential. On the alternative semantic theory sketched in this section, the content of a term relative to a context is an intension: a function from possible worlds to objects. The intension of a rigid designator relative to a context is just a constant function—a function that for any possible world returns the same object. The intension of a directly referential expression is just the same thing. Thus there is, on this alternative semantic theory, no difference in content between a directly referential expression that refers to an object o and a rigid, but not directly referential expression that refers to o. Thus on this alternative semantic theory, the following two terms have the same content relative to any context:

(32) 3

and

(33) the natural number x such that x(x-1)(x-2) = x + ((x-1) + (x-2))

Since both (32) and (33) rigidly designate the number three, the intension of each relative to a context is just the function that for any possible world returns the number three. Thus this alternative theory effaces two obvious differences between (32) and (33): one is a difference in structure, and the other is an intuitive difference between the fact that (32) serves merely to tag a particular number while the definite description (33) picks out the number three in virtue of a particular property of that number. Both of these differences are preserved in a semantic theory according to which propositions have structure that reflects the structure of the sentences expressing them.

6. Objections to Kaplan’s Semantic Theory and Logic

For the reasons immediately above, most philosophers prefer Kaplan’s semantic theory introduced in section 3 to the theory above based more strictly on Kaplan’s logic. The objections to Kaplan’s semantic theory that follow focus on the theory introduced in section 3.

a. Objections to Direct Reference

One of the consequences of Kaplan’s semantic theory noted in section 3e is that indexicals and demonstratives are directly referential: relative to a context, the content of an indexical is just the object that the indexical refers to relative to that context. As a result, for any context c relative to which two indexicals refer to the same thing, the two indexicals have the same content. It follows that two sentences that differ only in so far as one contains one of these indexicals where the other sentence contains the other indexical will express the same proposition relative to any context relative to which the two indexicals have the same content. Suppose, for example, that Saul Kripke sees an individual in a mirror, and gesturing toward the mirror utters (34) and (35):

(34) I am Saul Kripke.

(35) He is not Saul Kripke.

It turns out, however, that Kripke is in fact seeing himself in the mirror, and so has referred to himself with “he”. Relative to this context, the two sentences that Kripke has uttered express the following propositions:

〈IDENTITY, 〈Saul Kripke, Saul Kripke〉〉

〈NEGATION, 〈IDENTITY, 〈Saul Kripke, Saul Kripke〉〉〉

(Where IDENTITY is the relation of being the same thing as, and NEGATION is the property of being false (or not true).) The second of these propositions is just the negation of the first. Thus relative to the context of Kripke’s utterance, (34) and (35) express contradictory propositions. If Kripke’s utterances are indicative of Kripke’s beliefs, then it appears to follow that Kripke believes these two contradictory propositions. Yet it is implausible to think that Kripke, careful logician that he is, would believe two obviously contradictory propositions such as these. (For the beginning of a response, see section 4b.)

A second objection to the thesis that indexicals and demonstratives are directly referential concerns the use of demonstrative pronouns “this” and “that” in complex noun phrases, such as “that dog chewing on a stick” or “this city”. Such phrases are usually called complex demonstratives. The standard Kaplanian view of complex demonstratives is that relative to a context c, (an occurrence of) the complex demonstrative “that F” refers to the object assigned to (the occurrence of) it by c, provided that the object satisfies the predicate F relative to c. Examples like (36) cast doubt on this consequence of Kaplan’s theory:

(36) Every hiker of the John Muir Trail remembers that day they stood on the summit of Mt. Whitney.

Sentence (36) contains a complex demonstrative “that day they stood on the summit of Mt. Whitney”. According to Kaplan’s theory, the content of this complex demonstrative relative to a context should be a particular day. Yet it is clear that the proposition expressed by (36) does not contain any particular day as a constituent. The proposition is not about any one particular day, but is instead about how each hiker remembers a different day. This is because the complex demonstrative contains a pronoun, “they”, which is bound by the quantifier phrase “every hiker of the John Muir Trail”.

A third objection to the thesis that indexicals and demonstratives are directly referential also concerns complex demonstratives. This objection is based on the observation that there are uses of complex demonstratives where there is no intuitive reference at all. An example is an utterance of (37):

(37) That first wolf that allowed itself to be domesticated did pretty well.

The speaker of this utterance clearly has no particular wolf in mind of which it would be correct to say that the speaker is referring to that wolf. Rather, the speaker is making a general claim to the effect that whatever wolf first allowed itself to be domesticated did pretty well. Thus in this case, there is nothing associated with the speaker’s utterance—no gesture or appropriate intention—that could serve to fix the reference of the demonstrative “that first wolf that allowed itself to be domesticated”. A semantics for demonstratives according to which they are directly referential cannot account for this: if there is nothing to fix the reference of the speaker’s use of the demonstrative, then according to Kaplan’s theory, the speaker’s utterance should be defective, inviting from the audience the question “which wolf are you referring to”? But the speaker’s utterance is not defective. Kaplan’s theory does not have the resources to explain cases like this.

b. Objections to Kaplan’s Treatment of Contexts

A different source of worries about Kaplan’s theory is his treatment of contexts as sequences of parameters. On Kaplan’s view, a context c can be identified with the sequence

〈c_A, c_P, c_T, c_W〉,

where c_A is what Kaplan calls the agent, c_P the location, c_T the time, and c_W the world of the context, respectively. Indexicals have contents relative to these contexts. This treatment of contexts raises a problem for Kaplan’s semantic theory insofar as one of the basic goals of a semantic theory for a language like English is to determine constraints on what speakers of the language can use words and sentences of the language to strictly and literally say. The problem is how to apply Kaplan’s theory to actual and possible uses of language by speakers. Without some rule or principle that assigns formal contexts of Kaplan’s theory to uses of indexicals by speakers, Kaplan’s theory fails to achieve this basic goal of a semantic theory.

An example of such a principle for assigning contexts to uses is what we can call the naïve view of contexts:

For any utterance u of an indexical or sentence containing an indexical, the semantically relevant or semantically appropriate formal context for u is the sequence 〈c_A, c_P, c_T, c_W〉 such that c_A is the speaker of u, c_P is the location at which u occurs, c_T is the time at which u occurs, and c_W is the world in which u occurs.

The naïve view yields the correct results for many uses of sentences containing indexicals. If David Kaplan arrives at a party at 8 PM on January 31, 1973, and utters “I am here now!”, what Kaplan has intuitively said is that he is at the party at the time of his utterance. The naïve view would assign to Kaplan’s utterance of this sentence the context

〈David Kaplan, the location of the party, 8 PM on 1/31/1973, w〉.

Relative to this context, the content of “I am here now” is the proposition that David Kaplan is at the location of the party at 8 PM on January 31, 1973. This is just what we take David Kaplan to have said. In this way, principles like the naïve view bridge the gap between the formal contexts of Kaplan’s semantic theory and actual and possible uses of indexicals in communication.

One problem with the naïve view of contexts is that the nature of utterances is left underspecified. An example discussed earlier in the section on logic will help to illustrate the issue: if someone records “I am not here now” on their answering machine, and someone else later calls and hears this recorded message, what event counts as the utterance? Is it the act of recording the message, or the act of calling and triggering the replay of the message? Or the event of the replay of the message itself? Written messages generate similar questions. The issues raised by written notes and recorded messages are currently a topic of much debate in the philosophy of language. (For an extended discussion and references, see Predelli.)

c. Objections to Kaplan’s Logic

One final objection to Kaplan’s theory focuses on Kaplan’s logic. This objection focuses on Kaplan’s claims about the logical behavior of indexicals and demonstratives. According to Kaplan’s logic, an argument like (38) is valid, because the conclusion is true relative to any context relative to which the premise is true (trivially, since the premise and conclusion are the same):

(38) It is quiet now; therefore, it is quiet now.

Recall (from section 2e) that Kaplan argued against utterance-based theories precisely on the grounds that such theories predicted that arguments like this are invalid, because there are utterances of (38) in which the utterance of the premise is true, but the utterance of the conclusion false (if it turns suddenly very noisy halfway through the utterance of (38), for example).

Yet some philosophers have argued for precisely the opposite conclusion: that examples like this show that Kaplan’s claims about the logic of indexicals are wrong. A valid argument should provide a kind of epistemic assurance that anyone who uses the argument in reasoning will never be led from truth to falsehood. Yet the example above of the use of (38) appears to show that there are cases in which one who uses (38) in reasoning can be led from truth to falsehood. Thus, (38) does not provide the kind of epistemic assurance that a valid argument should provide.

The effect of this objection is potentially quite radical. If it is correct, then many arguments that at first glance appear to be valid are not valid. Exactly how radical the objection is depends in part on how widespread the phenomenon of indexicality is in natural language. Some philosophers, for example, have argued that quantifier phrases like “every sailor” are context-sensitive in a way very much like traditional indexicals like “I” or “now” are context-sensitive. If this is correct, and the objection currently under consideration holds, then the traditional syllogism (39) is invalid:

(39) Every sailor is human; every human is a mammal; therefore, every sailor is a mammal.

This objection to Kaplan’s logic thus has potentially far-reaching consequences. (For an example of a philosopher who embraces these consequences, see Yagisawa.)

7. Alternatives to Kaplan’s Theory of Indexicals

Recent work on the semantics of indexicals has seen a proliferation of alternatives to Kaplan’s theory. These alternatives usually take one of two forms: (i) theories that reject Kaplan’s appeal to contexts (as formal objects) altogether in favor of a token-reflexive (or utterance-reflexive) semantic treatment of indexicals, and (ii) theories that retain Kaplan’s formal apparatus of contexts and character but propose alternative hypotheses about the meanings of particular indexicals or demonstratives. This section presents the most influential current token-reflexive theory, before turning to a very brief sketch of a handful of alternatives that are within the Kaplanian framework (or something very much like it).

a. John Perry’s Reflexive-Referential Theory

The most developed utterance-based semantics for indexicals is currently John Perry’s “referential-reflexive” theory. The distinguishing feature of Perry’s theory is the suggestion that a single utterance u of a sentence like “I am hungry” is associated with several different kinds of content. Chief among these are (i) the referential content of u, and (ii) the reflexive content of u. In this way, Perry seeks to combine the insights of Reichenbach and Burks and the direct reference semantics of Kaplan into one theory of indexicals.

To illustrate the difference between these two kinds of content, let u be an utterance of “I am hungry” by Saul Kripke. Then according to Perry, the referential content of u is the singular proposition that Saul Kripke is hungry. This is the same content that Kaplan’s theory would assign to the sentence relative to a formal context in which Kripke is the agent. But Perry also recognizes a distinct variety of content expressed by the utterance: the reflexive content of u is the proposition that the speaker of u is hungry. This is (roughly) the content that Reichenbach’s theory would assign to u.

Perry’s theory is based on several subtle distinctions. The first is a distinction between different ways in which the environment of an utterance influences the interpretation of that utterance. Perry calls the environment in which an utterance occurs the context of the utterance, and distinguishes between two roles of context, which he calls “pre-semantic” and “semantic”. (It is important to recognize that Perry’s use of “context” is distinct from Kaplan’s—according to Kaplan, a context is a formal object of a semantic theory; according to Perry, a context is a complex situation that includes an utterance.) Pre-semantic uses of context involve using cues from the context of an utterance to resolve ambiguities, such as knowing whether a speaker who utters

I saw her at the bank

is talking about a financial institution or a riverside, or knowing whether a speaker who utters

I saw her duck under the table

is talking about someone’s attempt to dodge something or instead is talking about someone’s choice of pet. Thus, we use the context of an utterance pre-semantically in order to determine the structure and conventional meanings intended by the speaker of the utterance.

Semantic uses of the context of an utterance include the interpretation of any indexicals uttered in the course of the utterance. Here Perry makes two further distinctions, one between different kinds of features of a context, and one between the different ways indexicals exploit these different features. The first of these is a distinction between what Perry calls narrow context and wide context. The narrow context of an utterance comprises constitutive features of the utterance. Perry takes these to be the agent, time, and location of the utterance. Changing any of these results in a different utterance. The wide context of an utterance is, in effect, everything else that might be relevant to the interpretation of the indexicals uttered in the utterance. One of Perry’s examples of a feature of wide context is the length of the space between a speaker’s hands when a speaker utters

It was yea big.

This is a feature of the context of the utterance that could be changed without resulting in a different utterance. Thus, it is not a component of the narrow context of the utterance. Features of wide context are thus optional in a way that features of narrow contexts are not: there are utterances in which a speaker does not indicate any length of space between his or her hands, but there is no utterance that does not take place at a certain time.

The second distinction Perry makes in his account of semantic uses of context in the interpretation of indexicals is between kinds of indexicals. According to Perry, some indexicals are such that the referential content of an utterance of them is fixed automatically in the context of the utterance in virtue of their meanings. These are very much like Kaplan’s “pure indexicals”. The least controversial example of an automatic indexical in Perry’s theory is the first-person pronoun “I”. Another plausible candidate is the modal indexical “actually”, any utterance of which automatically picks out the world in which the utterance occurs.

In contrast to automatic indexicals, Perry argues that some indexicals are such that the referential content of an utterance of them is determined in part by certain intentions with which the speaker of the utterance utters them. The clearest examples of such intentional indexicals are Kaplan’s true demonstratives: the demonstrative pronouns “this”, “that”, “these”, “those”, and “there”. But Perry also notes that the referential contents of certain utterances of “now” and “here” are fixed by the speakers’ intentions. An example is the use of “now” in an utterance of

The summers are warmer now than they were ten years ago.

The crucial observation here is that the referential content of “now” is a certain (perhaps not totally determinate) span of time, and the length of this span is determined by the speaker’s intentions.

Yet it is also the case that the referential content of any utterance of “now” is constrained in such a way that the span of time to which the utterance refers must include the time of the utterance: a feature of the narrow context of the utterance. This illustrates how Perry’s two distinctions—narrow versus wide context, and automatic versus intentional indexicals—cross cut each other. The result is a fourfold classification of indexicals:

NA Narrow Context; Automatic Indexical: “I”, “actually”

NI Narrow Context; Intentional Indexical: “now”, “here”

WA Wide Context; Automatic Indexical: “tomorrow”, “yea”

WI Wide Context; Intentional Indexical: “this”, “that dog”, “there”

The referential content of an utterance of an NA indexical is fixed automatically to some feature of the narrow context. The referential content of an utterance of an NI indexical is fixed by the intentions of the speaker of the utterance, but is constrained in some way by some feature of the narrow context. The referential content of an utterance of a WA indexical is fixed automatically to some feature of the wide context of the utterance. Finally, the referential content of an utterance of a WI indexical is fixed by the intentions of the speaker of the utterance, and only constrained, if at all, by whatever features of the wide context are determined by the speaker’s intentions.

The reflexive content of an utterance of an indexical, on Perry’s theory, is roughly the content that encodes what a speaker who is competent with the indexical has to know about the utterance in virtue of which they are in a position to identify the referential content of the utterance. This is captured in the claim that the reflexive content of an utterance u of “I am hungry” is the descriptive proposition that the speaker of u is hungry. Anyone who overhears u is in a position to understand this reflexive content. But only someone who can identify the speaker of u is in a position to grasp the referential content of u. In this way, Perry attempts to revive Burks’s theory of the indexical meaning of a token (or utterance) as a theory of what a competent language user has to know in order to understand that token.

b. Expression-Based Alternatives

Recent work on the semantics of indexicals and demonstratives has led to a proliferation of alternative proposals. Many of these proposals focus on complex demonstratives (see section 6a). The challenge for theories of complex demonstratives is to accommodate both the examples that support Kaplan’s theory—according to which both simple and complex demonstratives are directly referential—and the examples (some of which were presented in section 6a) in which complex demonstratives behave in ways inconsistent with Kaplan’s theory.

One way to meet the challenge of the range of examples is to propose that complex demonstratives are ambiguous. On this view, it is possible to maintain that the examples of complex demonstratives that support Kaplan’s theory are cases of direct reference, while the other examples are cases in which the complex demonstratives in question have a different semantics. One advantage to such a theory is that it preserves the theoretical elegance and intuitive appeal of Kaplan’s treatment of standard referential uses of complex demonstratives. One disadvantage of such a theory is that positing an ambiguity is often thought of as a cheap solution to a problem. Thus, any philosopher or linguist who wants to defend an ambiguity theory of this sort has to argue that the ambiguity is well-motivated, and not simply a response to recalcitrant examples. (For further discussion of ambiguity theories, see Georgi, 2012.)

A different way to meet the challenge posed by the range of uses of complex demonstratives is to argue that some set of these uses reveals the true semantic nature of complex demonstratives, and then show how to explain the other uses within the framework of the proposed semantics. Two recent proposals along these lines are due to Jeffrey C. King and to David Braun. According to King, the uses of complex demonstratives discussed in section 6a show that complex demonstratives are not directly referential at all. On King’s view, complex demonstratives are quantifiers, like “every dog”, or “some homemade cookie”. The key semantic feature of quantifiers is that their content, relative to a context, is not an object or individual. Rather, the content of a quantifier relative to a context is itself a structured, complex entity, whose components are the contents of the expressions that occur within the quantifier. King defends an elaborate theory of the quantificational meanings of complex demonstratives, and shows how this theory accommodates a wide range of linguistic data.

In contrast to King’s theory, David Braun defends a traditional Kaplanian treatment of complex demonstratives as directly referential. On Braun’s view, the uses of complex demonstratives in section 6a that appear to conflict with Kaplan’s theory can be explained on pragmatic grounds: they are cases in which what a speaker means goes above and beyond what the speaker strictly and literally says. This allows Braun to maintain Kaplan’s theory, and to explain the apparently conflicting data, while rejecting the claim that complex demonstratives are ambiguous.

8. References and Further Reading

Bach, Kent. 1992. “Intentions and Demonstrations.” Analysis, 52(3): 140–146.
- Bach defends the view that demonstrative reference is fixed by the speaker’s referential intentions.
Braun, David. 1996. “Demonstratives and Their Linguistic Meanings.” Noûs, 30(2): 145–173.
- This paper is the source of the influential context-shifting semantic theory of demonstratives.
Braun, David. 2008. “Complex Demonstratives and Their Singular Contents.” Linguistics and Philosophy, 31: 57–99.
- Braun defends a direct reference semantics for complex demonstratives from the objections raised by Jeff King and others.
Burks, Arthur W. 1949. “Icon, Index, and Symbol.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 9(4): 673–689.
- Burks provides both an insightful discussion of Peirce’s original remarks on indexicals and a sophisticated theory of their meaning.
García-Carpintero, Manuel. 1998. “Indexicals as Token-Reflexives.” Mind, 107: 529–563.
- García-Carpintero presents a careful analysis of token-reflexive views of indexicals and defends them from several influential objections.
Georgi, Geoff. 2012. “Reference and Ambiguity in Complex Demonstratives.” In William P. Kabasenche, Michael O’Rourke, and Matthew H. Slater (eds), Reference and Referring: Topics in Contemporary Philosophy, v.10. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, pp. 357–384.
- Georgi defends a view of complex demonstratives according to which they are ambiguous between referential and non-referential readings.
Kamp, Hans. 1971. “Formal Properties of ‘Now.’” Theoria, 37: 237–273.
- Kamp’s paper is an early and influential discussion of double-indexing, or two-dimensional semantics, as applied to natural languages.
Kaplan, David. 1989a. “Demonstratives.” In Joseph Almog, John Perry, and Howard Wettstein (eds), Themes from Kaplan. New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 481–563.
- Kaplan’s most influential work on demonstratives. Its subtitle says it all: “an essay on the semantics, logic, metaphysics, and epistemology of demonstratives and other indexicals.”
Kaplan, David. 1989b. “Afterthoughts.” In Joseph Almog, John Perry, and Howard Wettstein (eds), Themes from Kaplan. New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 565–614.
- Kaplan provides further reflection on some of the main themes of “Demonstratives.”
King, Jeffrey C. 2001. Complex Demonstratives. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- King presents several powerful criticisms of Kaplan’s direct reference semantics for complex demonstratives, and defends an alternative semantic theory according to which complex demonstratives are context-sensitive quantifiers.
Kripke, Saul. 1980. Naming and Necessity. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Kripke argues against descriptivist theories of the meaning and reference of proper names and natural kind terms, along the way introducing the definition of rigid designation.
Perry, John. 1977. “Frege on Demonstratives.” The Philosophical Review, 86(4): 474–497.
- Perry argues that indexicals and demonstratives pose a puzzle for the Fregean theory of meaning as sense.
Perry, John. 1979. “The Problem of the Essential Indexical.” Noûs, 13(1): 3–21.
- Perry offers several influential examples in support of the view that indexicals play a privileged role in epistemology.
Perry, John. 2001. Reference and Reflexivity. Stanford, CA: CSLI Publications.
- Perry presents a sophisticated token-reflexive alternative to Kaplan’s semantic theory that contains many insights into the behavior of indexicals.
Predelli, Stefano. 2005. Contexts. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Predelli investigates the philosophical foundations of the second kind of semantic theory attributed to Kaplan.
Reichenbach, Hans. 1947. Elements of Symbolic Logic. New York: Macmillan.
- The book contains the original statement of the view that indexicals are token-reflexives.
Reimer, Marga. “Do Demonstrations Have Semantic Significance?” Analysis, 51(4): 177–183.
- Reimer argues that the reference of a use of a demonstrative is fixed by the associated demonstration (or gesture).
Salmon, Nathan. 2002. “Demonstrating and Necessity.” The Philosophical Review, 111(4): 497–537.
- Salmon argues for an alternative treatment of demonstratives within Kaplan’s semantic framework, according to which demonstrations are included in the context.
Salmon, Nathan. 2005. Reference and Essence, 2^nd Edition. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books.
- Salmon investigates the relationship between the theory of direct reference in semantics and essentialism in metaphysics.
Schlenker, Philippe. 2003. “A Plea for Monsters.” Linguistics and Philosophy, 26: 29–120.
- Schlenker presents data supporting the existence of monsters in natural language—specifically in propositional attitude reports—and offers a semantic theory that accommodates these data.
Soames, Scott. 2002. Beyond Rigidity. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Soames attempts to consolidate the lessons of Kripke’s Naming and Necessity. Chapter 2 includes a sophisticated discussion of rigid designation and its significance for Kripke’s arguments against descriptivism about proper names.
Soames, Scott. 2005. Reference and Description. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- Soames presents an analysis and criticism of the approach to meaning called “two-dimensional semantics”, including a careful discussion of Kaplan’s logic and semantics of indexicals.
Yagisawa, Takashi. 1993. “Logic Purified.” Noûs, 27(4): 470–486.
- Yagisawa applies the techniques of Kaplan’s logic to more natural uses of language.

Author Information

Geoff Georgi
Email: Geoff.Georgi@mail.wvu.edu
West Virginia University
U. S. A.

David Hume: Imagination

David Hume (1711–1776) approaches questions in epistemology, metaphysics, ethics and aesthetics via questions about our minds. For example, before addressing the epistemological question of whether we have any justification for our beliefs about unobserved states of affairs, Hume asks which of our cognitive faculties is responsible for these beliefs. Before addressing the metaphysical question, What is causal necessity (or necessary connexion)? , he asks what idea we have of a necessary connection between a cause and its effect. And before addressing the ethical question of why we are morally obligated to treat other people justly, he asks why we naturally sympathize with people whose interests suffer due to injustice. Hume tries to answer these and other questions about our minds empirically (that is, by observing himself and other people) and systematically. He calls this project his “science of man”; today, we would regard it as an amalgam of philosophy of mind, psychology and sociology.

One of the main discoveries that Hume claims to make, as a scientist of man, is that “men are mightily govern’d by the imagination.” He argues that the faculty of imagination is responsible for important features both of each individual human being’s mind and of the social arrangements that human beings form collectively. Concerning each individual human being’s mind, Hume argues that the imagination explains how we can form “abstract” or “general” ideas (that is, ideas that represent categories of things); how we reason from causes to their effects, or from effects to their causes; why we tend to sympathize, or share the feelings of other people; and why we project some of our feelings onto objects in the world around us. He also argues that the imagination explains numerous “fictions” that we believe. Concerning human social arrangements, Hume argues that features of the imagination explain why we need to form governments, and shape the laws that we adopt, including those that govern the distribution of property and those that govern the passage of national authority from one monarch to the next.

This article starts by explaining Hume’s views about thought in general. It then focuses on his views about imaginative thought in particular. It explains his conception of the imagination and its relations to our other faculties of thought, highlighting the continuities and discontinuities between his views and those of his Early Modern predecessors. It then presents some of the basic functions that Hume thinks the imagination performs, and surveys some highlights of his science of man, showing how he uses the imagination’s basic functions to explain several important mental phenomena. It then examines “fictions of the imagination,” which have an important place in his science of man, and his view that whatever we can clearly imagine is possible. Lastly, it discusses the relationship between Hume’s theory of the imagination and his skepticism.

Thought, Ideas and the Copy Principle
The Imagination and Our Other Faculties of Thought
Five Basic Functions of the Inclusive Imagination
Four Non-Basic Functions of the Inclusive Imagination
Fictions of the Imagination
Imaginability and Possibility
The Imagination and Hume’s Skepticism
References and Further Reading

1. Thought, Ideas and the Copy Principle

Hume writes that “men are mightily govern’d by the imagination” (T 3.2.7.2; SBN 534). And imagination is a kind of thought. To understand Hume’s views about imaginative thought, specifically, we must first examine some of his views about thought in general: his distinction between impressions and ideas; his distinction between simple and complex perceptions; and his Copy Principle. Hume’s main discussions of these topics are in A Treatise of Human Nature (hereafter, Treatise) Book 1, Part 1, Section 1; paragraphs 5–7 of Hume’s “Abstract” of the Treatise; and Section 2 of An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding (hereafter, “first Enquiry”).

Hume tries to explain everything that takes place in our minds, including thought, by appealing to perceptions and their interactions. He distinguishes two kinds of perceptions: impressions and ideas (T 1.1.1.1; SBN 1–2; T Abs 5; SBN 647; and E 2.1–3; SBN 17–18). He equates having impressions with “feeling,” or first-hand experience. So, our impressions include all of the sensations, passions and emotions that we experience when we engage in sensory perception, feel painful or pleasurable sensations in our bodies, or feel passions like love and hatred. He equates having ideas with thinking: in his view, thinking about an object, or thinking that a certain state of affairs obtains, involves forming an idea that represents this object or state of affairs. The only difference that Hume sees between impressions and ideas is their degree of force and liveliness, or force and vivacity. Impressions are more forceful and lively than ideas: for example, actually feeling a pain is more forceful and lively than merely thinking about a pain. (Scholars disagree about how to interpret Hume’s talk of force and vivacity. According to some, a perception’s force and vivacity is matter of how it feels to have that perception—that is, a matter of its phenomenology. According to others, a perception’s force and vivacity is a matter of how it behaves in our minds—that is, a matter of its functional role.)

Hume also distinguishes simple and complex perceptions (T 1.1.1.2; SBN 2). This cuts across his distinction between impressions and ideas, so that there are four categories of perception altogether: simple impressions; complex impressions; simple ideas; and complex ideas. A complex perception is made up of parts. For example, when you look at a Granny Smith apple in good light, you experience an array of color-sensations; Hume would regard this array of sensations as a complex impression. When you bite into a Granny Smith apple, you experience a sensation that is made up of various taste-sensations, smell-sensations, tactile sensations of the apple’s texture on your tongue, and so forth. Again, Hume would regard this overall sensation as a complex impression. When you think about a Granny Smith apple, you form a complex idea (or less forceful perception) made up of similar parts. Suppose that we broke one of these complex perceptions up into its parts, and examined each of them individually. Perhaps we would find that some of these perceptions have parts of their own. For example, perhaps your impression of the apple’s taste is itself made up of different parts—a sweet-sensation and a tart-sensation, say. Hume thinks that this process of breaking a perception into parts, and then breaking these parts into parts, could not go on forever. Eventually, we would reach perceptions that have no parts of their own. Hume calls these perceptions simple. He holds that every perception is either simple, or is built up entirely from simple perceptions, in which case it is complex. (Hume does not explicitly distinguish simple from complex perceptions in the “Abstract” or the opening sections of the first Enquiry. Nonetheless, he continues to rely on this distinction: for example, see E 2.5–6; SBN 19, E 3.1; SBN 23 and E 7.4; SBN 62.)

Hume argues that each of your simple ideas is caused by, and exactly resembles, a simple impression that you have previously had—in other words, each of your simple ideas is an exact copy of one of your simple impressions (T 1.1.1.7–12; SBN 4–7; T Abs 6–7; SBN 647–8; E 2.4–9; SBN 18–22). Scholars often call this Hume’s Copy Principle. Since Hume thinks that every idea is either simple or complex, and that a complex idea is entirely made up of simple ones, it follows that every idea is either an exact copy of an impression, or is entirely made up of such copies. Because ideas are less forceful than impressions, Hume calls them “faint images” of our impressions.

According to Hume, then, thinking involves forming a faint image, or assembling a montage of faint images, of sensations, passions, and emotions. Since the imagination is a faculty of thought, it is a faculty by which we form such images.

2. The Imagination and Our Other Faculties of Thought

This section addresses Hume’s views about the faculty of imagination, its parts or sub-faculties, and its relationship to the two other faculties of thought that Hume distinguishes: memory and reason. The main texts on this topic are Treatise Book 1, Part 1, Section 3; Book 1, Part 3, Section 5; and Hume’s footnote to Book 1, Part 3, Section 9, Paragraph 19.

a. Two Senses of “Imagination”

In the Treatise, Hume explains that he uses the word “imagination” (and its synonym, “fancy”) in two different senses:

When I oppose the imagination to the memory, I mean the faculty, by which we form our fainter ideas. When I oppose it to reason, I mean the same faculty, excluding only our demonstrative and probable reasonings. (T 1.3.9.19n22; SBN 118n)

Some twentieth century scholars thought that these two different senses of “imagination” refer to two completely different mental faculties: a faculty of feigning or make-believe, and a faculty for apprehending real things. (For example, see Kemp Smith 1941: 459.) However, this seems to conflict with what Hume says: that both senses of “imagination” refer to “the same faculty.” Therefore, scholars in the late twentieth and early twenty first century broadly agree on the following interpretation of the two senses. In one sense, “imagination” picks out a faculty that is responsible for all of our thoughts except for memories. In this sense, the imagination includes our faculty of “reason”—by which Hume here means our faculty for carrying out “demonstrative or probable reasonings”—as one of its parts or sub-faculties. Let us therefore call it the inclusive imagination. In the second sense that Hume distinguishes, “imagination” picks out the non-rational part or sub-faculty of the inclusive imagination—the part that is not reason. Hume indicates that this other, non-rational sub-faculty is responsible for our whimsies and prejudices (T 1.3.9.19n22; SBN 117n), and often suggests that its properties seem to be trivial (T 1.4.2.56, 1.4.6.6n50, 1.4.7.3, 1.4.7.6, 1.4.7.7; SBN 217, 254, 265, 267). Because it excludes reason as well as memory, let us call this non-rational sub-faculty the exclusive imagination.

b. Inclusive Imagination vs. Memory

Hume contrasts the inclusive imagination with the memory. What difference does he see between these faculties? Early in the Treatise, he explains that they differ in two main ways. First, the ideas that make up a memory are “much more lively and strong” than the ideas that we form by the inclusive imagination (T 1.1.3.1; SBN 9). Second, the ideas that make up a memory must occur in the same “order and form,” or “order and position,” as the impressions from which they are copied (T 1.1.3.2–3; SBN 9). For example, when I remember a melody that I have heard, my ideas of the notes composing that melody must occur in the same order as my earlier impressions of those notes. In contrast, the imagination “is not restrain’d to the same order or form with the original impressions” (T 1.1.3.2; SBN 9). I can imagine a melody made up of notes that I have experienced before, but occurring in an order that I have never experienced before.

According to Hume, then, the ideas that we form in the course of remembering things are not completely different from those that we form when we are imagining things. In fact, these ideas are intrinsically alike, save for their degree of force and vivacity: they are all “faint images” of impressions, or montages of such images; but the ideas of the inclusive imagination are even fainter than those of the memory.

c. Exclusive Imagination vs. Reason

Hume distinguishes two parts or sub-faculties within the inclusive imagination: the exclusive imagination and reason. What difference does he see between these sub-faculties? Again, there seem to be two main answers. First, these sub-faculties differ with respect to their function, or what they do. By “reason,” Hume here means the sub-faculty by which we make demonstrative and probable inferences. In contrast, the exclusive imagination is the sub-faculty by which we form non-rational whimsies and prejudices, and various imaginative “fictions,” which are discussed in section (5) below. Second, these sub-faculties differ with respect to the permanence, irresistibility and universality of their operations. Operations of reason, like inferring causes from their effects, are permanent, irresistible and universal features of human minds. In contrast, the whimsies and prejudices due to the exclusive imagination occur only at certain times and in certain places, and they can be avoided with sufficient strength of mind.

However, perhaps Hume thinks that some operations of the exclusive imagination are just as permanent, irresistible, and universal as those of reason. He says that probable reasoning and our belief that sensible objects continue to exist, at times when nobody perceives them, are “equally natural and necessary in the human mind” (T 1.4.7.4; SBN 266). But he also says that our belief in the continued, unperceived existence of sensible objects is a fiction due to the exclusive imagination (T 1.4.2.14–43 and 52; SBN 193–209 and 215). So, he seems to hold that at least one operation of the exclusive imagination—its production of this belief—is just as permanent, irresistible, and universal as the operations of reason.

According to some scholars, Hume uses the word “reason” in different ways, only sometimes using it to pick out the sub-faculty of the inclusive imagination by which we carry out demonstrative and probable reasoning. Therefore, the reader should be careful not to assume that Hume is always talking about this sub-faculty, whenever he talks about reason.

For further discussion of Hume’s contrast (or contrasts) between reason and the imagination, see section (7), below.

d. Continuities between Hume’s Views and His Predecessors’

Among Early Modern philosophers, the imagination was generally conceived as our faculty for forming a distinctive kind of idea: mental “images” that resemble sensory experiences. For example, René Descartes writes that “whatever we conceive with an image is an idea of the imagination” (“To Mersenne, July 1641”; CSMK 186) and explains that imaginative images resemble sensory experience:

When I imagine a triangle, for example, I do not merely understand that it is a figure bounded by three lines, but at the same time I also see the three lines with my mind’s eye as if they were present before me; and this is what I call imagining. (CSM 2:50)

When one imagines a triangle, it is “as if” one were sensing it. Similarly, Thomas Hobbes, Nicolas Malebranche and George Berkeley all characterize the imagination as a faculty for forming ideas that closely resemble sensory experiences.

As we have seen, Hume thinks that every idea is either simple or complex; that every simple idea is copied from a simple impression (that is, from a simple sensation, passion or emotion); and that every complex idea is made up entirely of simple ones. He must therefore accept that all ideas resemble experiences: a simple idea resembles the experience that we have, when we have the simple impression from which it is copied; and a complex idea resembles the experiences that we have, when we have the simple impressions from which its parts are copied. So, much like his predecessors, he holds that all the ideas we form by means of the inclusive imagination resemble sensory experiences—if the word “sensory” is construed in a broad way, so as to include passionate and emotional experiences. (Hume does not think that this is distinctive of the inclusive imagination: in his view, the memory also uses ideas that resemble sensory experiences. However, most of his Early Modern predecessors regarded memory as a kind of imagination, so there is no significant disagreement between him and them on this point.)

Hume’s Early Modern predecessors also thought that the imagination is a faculty by which we make a distinctive kind of transition among ideas: habituated, or associative, transitions. For example, Hobbes thinks that the successions of mental images that take place in the imagination tend to resemble the successions of sensory experiences that gave rise to those mental images. Similarly, Malebranche holds that each type of mental image is paired with a type of physical image or “trace” in the brain, and that these physical traces come to be connected or associated with each other; thanks to these connections among physical traces, the mental images that are paired with them also come to be associated. And Gottfried Leibniz writes that, in both human and non-human animal minds, the perceptions of the memory or imagination come to be associated by a kind of habituation.

Hume agrees with these philosophers that the inclusive imagination serves to associate its ideas, or faint images, with other perceptions; this applies to both of its parts or sub-faculties—reason and the exclusive imagination. Below, section (3c) discusses Hume’s views of imaginative association in detail; section (4) discusses some of its applications.

e. Discontinuities between Hume’s Views and His Predecessors’

There are two main discontinuities between Hume’s views of the imagination and those of earlier modern philosophers. First, numerous Early Modern philosophers held that we have a faculty of pure understanding or pure intellect, by which we can form purely intellectual ideas—ideas that are completely unlike sensations, passions, or emotions. For example, Descartes claims that we can understand the difference between a chiliagon (a 1,000-sided shape) and a myriagon (a 10,000-sided shape), but that we cannot represent this difference to ourselves by forming mental images. This is because the image that we form in trying to imagine a chiliagon is no different from the one that we form in trying to imagine a myriagon: in each case, the best that we can do is to make a fuzzy attempt to depict many sides (CSM 2:50). More importantly, by Descartes’s lights, we can form ideas of incorporeal things, such as God and the human soul, but we cannot imagine such things, because imagining is “simply contemplating the shape or image of a corporeal thing” (CSM 2:19). Descartes infers that, when we grasp the difference between a chiliagon and a myriagon, or conceive of God, we do so by forming a purely intellectual idea. Antoine Arnauld, Malebranche, Benedict De Spinoza and Gottfried Leibniz also posit purely intellectual ideas, in order to explain certain kinds of human thought.

Hume does not include a faculty of pure intellect in his taxonomy of mental faculties: he thinks that all ideas are faint images, or montages of such images, belonging to the memory or to the inclusive imagination. He has at least three reasons for denying that we have a faculty of pure intellect. First, he argues that the Copy Principle rules out purely intellectual ideas (T 1.3.1.7; SBN 72–73). Copying involves resemblance: a copy resembles the original from which it is made. So, if every simple idea is an exact copy of a simple impression, and every complex idea is composed wholly of simple ideas, then every idea resembles an impression or several impressions. So, no idea is purely intellectual.

Second, Hume gives specific arguments against the existence of certain purely intellectual ideas that Descartes and his followers had posited. For example, Descartes argued that we conceive the nature of a particular material substance, like a piece of wax, by means of the pure intellect. In contrast, Hume argues that we can only conceive a substance to be a collection of sensible qualities “united by the imagination” (T 1.1.6.1–2; SBN 15–16). So, we conceive of substances by means of the imagination, not by means of a purely intellectual idea. Similarly, Descartes held that the idea of God is purely intellectual. In contrast, Hume argues that one can form an idea of God by augmenting one’s idea of one’s own mind with further ideas copied from impressions (E 2.6; SBN 19).

Third, Hume thinks that his opponents’ principal reason for positing a faculty of pure intellect is to “explain our abstract ideas, and to show how we can form an idea of a triangle, for instance, which shall neither be an isosceles nor a scalenum, nor be confin’d to any particular length or proportion of sides” (T 1.3.1.7; SBN 72). Hume thinks that he can explain our abstract ideas just by appealing to the ideas and basic functions of the inclusive imagination. If this explanation succeeds, then it shows that we do not need a faculty of pure intellect in order to form abstract ideas. Therefore, Hume thinks that his explanation undermines his opponents’ principal reason for positing this faculty. Section (4a), below, discusses Hume’s account of abstract ideas in more detail.

The second main discontinuity between Hume’s views and those of his predecessors concerns reasoning. According to many of Hume’s predecessors, including Descartes, Leibniz and John Locke, reasoning involves mental events or processes that are both rational and basic, meaning that they cannot be explained in terms of any simpler mental events or processes. In contrast, Hume tries to explain reasoning in terms of more basic mental functions, which are common to reason and to the exclusive imagination. For example, he thinks that the same basic principles of association among ideas explain both flights of fancy due to the exclusive imagination and probable inferences due to reason. This is why Hume regards reason and the exclusive imagination as two sub-faculties of the inclusive imagination: their functions are built up out of the same basic imaginative functions.

Because Hume places our whole faculty of reason within the inclusive imagination, it seems he must say that demonstrative reasoning can be explained in terms of functions that are common to reason and the exclusive imagination. But it is a hard question whether he can carry out this explanation successfully. For a helpful discussion of this issue, see Owen (1999, 92 and 96–98).

3. Five Basic Functions of the Inclusive Imagination

As a scientist of man, Hume aims to explain some mental functions in terms of others. More specifically, he aims to take a complex and initially puzzling mental function, like our ability to carry out sophisticated pieces of probable reasoning, and show how this function is built up out of several simpler and less puzzling functions. Of course, Hume does not go on forever in this process of breaking down complex mental functions into simpler ones. His science of man leaves some mental functions unexplained. These functions are the basic building blocks from which other, more complex, mental functions are built. This section presents five of the main basic functions that Hume attributes to the inclusive imagination—that is, functions that his science of man does not try to explain. The next two sections show how he uses these basic functions to explain several other, more complex mental and social phenomena—some due to reason, others to the exclusive imagination.

Two caveats here: First, saying that a function of the inclusive imagination is basic does not mean that it has no explanation at all, in Hume’s view. He suggests that events taking place in our brains might explain the inclusive imagination’s basic functions (T 1.2.5.20; SBN 60–61). But he does not insist that this is true, and he remains officially agnostic about what, if anything, explains these functions; this question falls outside the scope of his science of man. Second, saying that a mental function is basic does not mean that we have no evidence that it takes place. Hume seems to think that each of us can observe the basic imaginative functions taking place in our minds. So, we have observational evidence that they take place, even though we do not have a scientific explanation of how or why they do. He may also think that his success in using these basic functions to explain other, more complex phenomena gives him further evidence that they take place in our minds (Owen 1999, 77–79).

a. Forming Faint Copies of Simple Impressions

Hume thinks that each of our ideas is either copied from a simple impression (per the Copy Principle), or is built up entirely from simple ideas that are so copied. If our minds could not reproduce our simple impressions, by forming simple ideas copied from them, then we could not form any ideas at all. So, the function of reproducing simple impressions by forming copies of them must be common to the inclusive imagination and the memory—our two faculties for forming ideas. Of course, the copies or simple ideas that we form by means of the inclusive imagination have a lower degree of force, liveliness, or strength than those that we form by means of the memory. Hume does not try to explain how the inclusive imagination forms faint copies of our simple impressions; he simply observes that it does. Hence, this is a basic function of the inclusive imagination. Hume’s main discussions of this function are in Treatise Book 1, Part 1, Section 1; and in the first Enquiry, Section 2.

b. Manipulating the Parts of Ideas

Once we have acquired some ideas by forming copies of our impressions, the inclusive imagination can manipulate their parts in various ways. Hume gives several overlapping lists of these ways: for examples, see the Appendix to the Treatise, paragraph 2; the “Abstract” of the Treatise, paragraph 35; and the first Enquiry, Section 2, paragraph 5. Perhaps the most important two are i) what Hume calls separating or dividing ideas, and ii) what he calls uniting, compounding, or composing them. The inclusive imagination can break any complex idea into parts. For example, it can take an idea of a goat and break it down into an idea of the goat’s head, an idea of its torso, ideas of its legs, and so forth. This is what Hume calls separating or dividing ideas. Once it has broken some ideas down into their parts, it can reassemble these parts at pleasure. For example, it can combine the idea of a goat’s head with the idea of a lion’s body, so as to form the idea of a chimera. This is what Hume calls uniting, compounding, or composing ideas.

These two functions of the inclusive imagination are captured by Hume’s Liberty Principle, which says that the imagination is free to “transpose and change its ideas” by separating and re-uniting their parts (T 1.1.3.4; SBN 10). The Liberty Principle plays an important role in Hume’s philosophy by supporting his Separability Principle, which says that “whatever objects are different are distinguishable, and . . . whatever objects are distinguishable are separable by the thought and imagination” (T 1.1.7.3; SBN 18); by “objects,” here, Hume seems to mean the objects of thought or imagination—that is, the things of which we think or which we imagine. (For a helpful discussion of Hume’s varied use of the word “object,” see Grene 1994.) In turn, the Separability Principle underwrites some of Hume’s central arguments—for example, his argument that the proposition “whatever begins to exist, must have a cause of existence” is “neither intuitively nor demonstratively certain” (T 1.3.3.1–3; SBN 78–80).

A third important way of manipulating the parts of our ideas is what Hume calls augmenting our ideas: in other words, replicating a part of an idea and adding the replica back to the original idea, so as to produce an idea of something larger than what the original idea represented. Hume thinks that this allows us to form an idea of God, using only ideas that are copied from impressions (E 2.6; SBN 19).

Hume does not explain how the inclusive imagination manipulates the parts of its ideas in these ways. Doing so is another of its basic functions.

c. Association

Hume thinks that the inclusive imagination naturally associates some perceptions with others. He usually speaks of the association of ideas, but in some of the most important cases that he discusses, an idea is associated with an impression. For example, he claims that probable reasoning involves “a relation or association in the fancy betwixt the impression and idea” (T 1.3.8.7; SBN 101). Hume’s main discussions of association are in Treatise Book 1, Part 1, Section 4, and in the first Enquiry, Section 3.

According to Hume, there are three principles of association among ideas—in other words, there are three basic laws of the inclusive imagination, describing the ways in which ideas become associated with each other or with impressions. First, ideas tend to become associated if the objects that they represent resemble each other. In Hume’s example, an idea of a picture is associated with an idea of the object(s) that this picture depicts (E 3.3; SBN 24). Second, ideas tend to become associated if the objects that they represent are contiguous to each other, meaning that they are near to each other in space or time. In Hume’s example, the idea of an apartment in a building is associated with ideas of the other apartments in that building (ibid.). Third, ideas tend to become associated if the objects that they represent are causally related. In Hume’s example, the idea of a wound is associated with an idea of the pain caused by that wound (ibid.). Really, then, the phrase “association of ideas” covers three functions of the inclusive imagination.

Hume stresses that these three functions of the inclusive imagination are basic, or left unexplained by his science of man, while also stressing that we have evidence that the inclusive imagination performs these functions:

These are therefore the principles of union or cohesion among our simple ideas . . . Here is a kind of ATTRACTION, which in the mental world will be found to have as extraordinary effects as in the natural, and to show itself in as many and as various forms. Its effects are every where conspicuous; but as to its causes, they are mostly unknown, and must be resolv’d into original qualities of human nature, which I pretend not to explain. Nothing is more requisite for a true philosopher, than to restrain the intemperate desire of searching into causes, and having establish’d any doctrine upon a sufficient number of experiments, rest contented with that, when he sees a farther examination wou’d lead him into obscure and uncertain speculations. (T 1.1.4.6; 12–13. See also T 1.1.7.15; SBN 24)

Hume uses these three basic functions of the inclusive imagination to explain numerous other, more complex mental functions—some due to reason, others to the exclusive imagination. Sections (4) and (5), below, discuss some important examples. Hume is especially proud of this aspect of his science of man. He writes that his “use . . . of the principle of the association of ideas” is what, “if any thing,” can entitle him to “so glorious a name as that of an inventor” (T Abs 35; SBN 661).

In his discussions of the passions, Hume expands his account of association in several ways. Most importantly, he adds that the association of two ideas is strengthened if they are accompanied by impressions that resemble each other. This is because resembling impressions are themselves associated, and the two associative relations—that of the ideas, and that of the accompanying impressions—combine to give the mind a “double impulse” to move, associatively, from the first idea-impression pair to the second (T 2.1.4.4; SBN 284). Hume calls this phenomenon the “double relation of ideas and impressions” (T 2.1.5.5; 286–7). He uses it to explain the passions of pride, humility, love, and hatred.

Hume also adds that, in its associative transitions, the inclusive imagination gravitates towards objects that are more important, or closer to oneself in space and time. An idea that represents a relatively unimportant object—for example, a servant—tends to produce ideas of relatively important objects that are associated with it—for example, the servant’s master; in contrast, an idea of a master does not tend to produce an idea of his servant. Similarly, an idea that represents a relatively distant object—for example, one of Jupiter’s moons—tends to produce ideas of relatively nearby objects that are associated with it—for example, an idea of the Earth’s moon; in contrast, an idea of the Earth’s moon does not tend to produce an idea of one of Jupiter’s moons. When two ideas are associated in such a way that each of them is equally likely to be accompanied or followed by the other, Hume says that there is a “perfect relation” between the objects that they represent (T 2.2.4.10; 355).

d. Transmitting Force and Liveliness among Associated Perceptions

Hume thinks that impressions have more force and liveliness (or vivacity) than ideas in the memory, which in turn have more force and liveliness than ideas in the imagination. But he does not think that the latter all have the same low degree of force and liveliness; some of them have a higher degree than others. This allows him to explain the difference between an idea of a contingent state of affairs that we believe to obtain and an idea of one that we merely entertain or think about. Consider two people: someone who believes that there will be a third world war, and someone who entertains the thought that there will be one, but does not believe it. Hume will say that each of these people forms an idea in her imagination. (If the idea is a product of probable reasoning, it belongs to reason and hence to the inclusive imagination; if it is a whimsy or flight of fancy, it belongs to the exclusive imagination.) He will also say that each of their ideas represents the same thing—namely, a third world war’s taking place in the future. But there is a difference between the two ideas, which Hume must explain: one of them is a belief; the other is not. His explanation is that the former idea has more force and liveliness than the other.

Hume defines a belief as “a lively idea related to or associated with a present impression” (T 1.3.7.5; SBN 96). This is because he thinks that an idea must inherit its force and liveliness, directly or indirectly, from an impression. The impression gives force and liveliness to the idea, and thereby turns that idea into a belief; this belief, in turn, can give force and liveliness to other ideas.

In order for one perception to give force and liveliness to another, these perceptions must be associated: associative relations are akin to “pipes or canals” through which force and liveliness can flow (T 1.3.10.7; SBN 122). Hume thinks that associative links due to causation transmit a higher degree of force and liveliness than those due to resemblance or contiguity (T 1.3.9.8; SBN 110).

Transmitting force and liveliness among associated perceptions—especially, among those associated due to causation—is a fourth basic function of the inclusive imagination. In the Treatise, Hume uses it, together with the principles of association of ideas, to explain several important mental phenomena, including probable reasoning and sympathy. Sections (4b) and (4c), below, discuss these phenomena.

Hume’s main discussions of the transmission of force and liveliness are in Treatise Book 1, Part 3, Sections 7–9. Shortly after writing these sections, Hume seems to have changed his view about the nature of belief. In an Appendix published in the following year, together with Treatise Book 3, he wrote that two ideas of the same object can differ in ways other than their degree of force and vivacity (T App 22; SBN 636), and that “reflection on general rules keeps us from augmenting our belief upon every encrease of the force and vivacity of our ideas” (T 1.3.10.12App; SBN 632). This suggests that he no longer identified belief with a higher-than-usual degree of force and vivacity. Later, in the first Enquiry, he refrained from explicitly likening beliefs to impressions, in respect of their force and vivacity (E 5.11–13; SBN 48–50). How significantly did he change his views? Commentators disagree: for two different perspectives, see Owen (1999, 172–4) and Wilbanks (1968, 29–30). Whatever the answer may be, Hume clearly continued to hold that an idea is “enlivened” or receives additional “force and vigour” (E 5.15; SBN 51) when it is associatively related to an impression.

e. Completing the Union of Related Objects

Hume claims that, when our ideas of two objects are associated by certain relations, we tend to imagine further relations among them, in order to “compleat the union” (T 1.4.2.55; SBN 217); his main discussions of this function are in Treatise Book 1, Part 4, Sections 2 and 5.

Hume claims that this basic function of the inclusive imagination explains why those who believe in external objects that cause their impressions tend to believe that these objects also resemble their impressions: they add the relation of resemblance to that of causation in order to complete the union between the external object and the impression (T 1.4.2.55; SBN 217). Similarly, this function explains why we believe that sounds, tastes, and smells have spatial locations. In Hume’s view, these sensible qualities “exist nowhere” (T 1.4.5.10; SBN 235–6)—they do not have spatial locations. But we typically experience the taste and smell of an olive, say, at the same time as experiencing the olive itself; and we take the olive to cause its taste and smell. Because of our tendency to complete the union of related objects, we imaginatively add the relation of spatial contiguity to those of temporal contiguity and causation. In other words, we imagine that the olive’s taste and smell are located where the olive is.

Most importantly, Hume uses this basic imaginative function to explain certain forms of projection—our mind’s tendency to “spread itself on external objects” (T 1.3.14.25; SBN 167). Projection plays an important role in his theories of causal necessity and moral value. Section (4d), below, discusses it.

4. Four Non-Basic Functions of the Inclusive Imagination

Much of Hume’s philosophical work aims to explain how the inclusive imagination’s basic functions work together with each other and with other features of our minds, such as our passions, to produce complex mental and social phenomena. This section focuses on four important examples: abstract ideas, probable reasoning, sympathy, and projection. The next section focuses on an important class of examples that fall under the heading of “fiction.”

a. Abstract Ideas

Hume says that every idea is individual or particular. By this, he means both that the idea itself is a particular (not a universal) and that it represents a particular object: when we form an idea, “the image in the mind is only that of a particular object” (T 1.1.7.6; SBN 20). However, we are not restricted to thinking of one particular thing at a time. We can grasp thoughts like all dogs are mammals and all triangles are shapes. If an idea represents just one particular object, then how can we do this—how can we think of all the particular dogs that exist, or all the particular triangles? Hume’s answer is that a “particular idea” comes to serve as an “abstract” or “general” representation; in other words, it comes to represent all the particular things of some sort. He explains how this happens by appealing to the association of ideas.

Hume proposes that an idea serves as a general representation, if it is called to mind by a word—a common noun like “dog” or “triangle”—which is associated with many ideas of resembling objects. Suppose that, on hearing the word “dog,” you happen to form an idea of a particular dog, Fido. If it occurred on its own, this idea would represent just this one particular dog. But when it occurs in partnership with a word that is also associated with many other ideas of particular dogs (Spot, Rover, and so forth), the idea of Fido serves as a proxy for those other ideas (T 1.1.7.7–10; SBN 20–22). Hence, it serves as a representation of all dogs.

This explanation involves two of Hume’s principles of association. First, it involves contiguity. We have often uttered the word “dog,” or (more probably, if we are learning a language) have often heard this word uttered, in the presence of Fido. This contiguity in space and time between the word “dog” and Fido leads us to associate that word with him. Second, it involves resemblance. Because Fido, Spot, Rover, and other dogs resemble each other in many important ways, we come to associate the same term with each of them. Also thanks to this resemblance, an idea of one of these dogs tends to be followed by one or more ideas of the other dogs. Hume thinks that this helps one idea to serve as a proxy for the others.

Hume thinks that the main reason why other philosophers have posited a faculty of pure intellect, distinct from the inclusive imagination, is to “explain our abstract ideas, and to show how we can form an idea of a triangle, for instance, which shall neither be an isosceles nor a scalenum, nor be confin’d to any particular length or proportion of sides” (T 1.3.1.7; SBN 72). He presumably thinks that his own account of abstract ideas undermines this reason: it shows that the inclusive imagination can explain our abstract ideas; so, there is no need to posit an additional faculty of pure intellect.

Hume’s main discussion of this non-basic function of the inclusive imagination is in Treatise Book 1, Part 1, Section 7.

b. Probable Reasoning

By “probable reasoning,” “moral reasoning,” or “reasoning concerning matter of fact,” Hume means reasoning to beliefs about matters of fact that we have not observed. For example, we all believe that the sun will rise tomorrow. But this belief is not due to observation: we cannot have observed the sun’s rising tomorrow, because it has not happened yet. So, our belief that the sun will rise tomorrow must be due to probable reasoning: we must have reasoned our way to this belief, based on other things that we have observed. Hume distinguishes two main kinds of probable reasoning, which he calls proofs and probabilities (T 1.3.11.2; SBN 124). A proof is a piece of probable reasoning whose conclusion is “entirely free from doubt and uncertainty” (T 1.3.11.2; SBN 124). For example, we have no doubt that the sun will rise tomorrow. So, the piece of probable reasoning that leads us to this conclusion is a proof. A probability is a piece of probable reasoning whose conclusion is “still attended with uncertainty” (T 1.3.11.2; SBN 124). For example, when I have a headache, I believe with some confidence that taking acetaminophen will cure it. But I do not believe this with complete certainty: taking acetaminophen usually cures my headaches, but not always. So, the piece of probable reasoning that leads me to conclude that taking acetaminophen will cure my current headache is a probability. (To avoid confusion, it is important to recognize that Hume uses the terms “probable reasoning” and “probability” in two senses: i) an inclusive sense, in which these terms denote the genus of reasoning whose species are proofs and probabilities; and ii) an exclusive sense, in which they denote just one species of this genus—probabilities as opposed to proofs. For examples of the inclusive sense, see T 1.3.6.4, 1.3.6.6–7 and 1.3.9.19n22; SBN 89, 89–90 and 117–18n; for examples of the exclusive sense, see T 1.3.11.2; SBN 124. In this section, I will use “probable reasoning” only in the inclusive sense, and “probability” only in the exclusive sense.)

Hume observes that our ordinary actions and our scientific inquiries—including those that he himself conducts, as a scientist of man—depend on probable reasoning and the beliefs that it produces. Therefore, it is especially important to him to explain how our minds carry out this kind of reasoning. He argues that probable reasoning is a non-basic function of the inclusive imagination, built up from two basic ones: association, and the transmission of force and vivacity among associated perceptions.

To see this, let us consider Hume’s favorite example of an elementary proof: we see one billiard ball hurtling across the table towards a second ball, which is unobstructed; and we form the belief—without any doubt or uncertainty—that the two balls will collide, and that the second ball will start to move. In order to explain this piece of reasoning, Hume breaks it down into three parts (T 1.3.5.1; SBN 84). The first part is our “original impression”—in this case, a sensory impression of the two billiard balls. In general, Hume avoids the question of how our sensory impressions are produced, so he leaves this part of our reasoning unexplained.

The second part of our probable reasoning is a mental “transition” from our original impression to an idea that represents the two balls colliding, and the second ball starting to move. Hume famously argues that this transition is due to imaginative association. In the past, whenever we have observed billiard balls in similar situations—one ball hurtling towards another, unobstructed, ball—we have observed the balls to collide, and the second start to move. This course of past experience has established an associative relation: a perception of billiard balls in this situation now calls to our mind an idea of the balls colliding, and the second starting to move. It is due to this associative relation, Hume claims, that the sight of billiard balls in this situation now causes us to form such an idea (T 1.3.6.12–16; SBN 92–94). This is an example of association by causation—one of the three principles of association that Hume identifies; see section (3c), above. Hume thinks that only causation can inform us about unobserved matters of fact: that is, we can only learn about an unobserved matter of fact if it is causally related to some other matter, or matters, of fact that we have observed (T 1.3.2.2–3; SBN 73–74, E 4.4–5; SBN 26–27). So, he thinks that all probable reasoning involves association by causation.

The third part of our probable reasoning is the transmission of force and liveliness to our idea, so that we believe—not just entertain the thought—that the billiard balls will collide and that the second one will start to move. Once he has established that imaginative association explains our transition from our impression of the billiard balls to this idea, this third part of our reasoning is easy for Hume to explain. Impressions have a high degree of force and liveliness, and transmitting force and liveliness among associated perceptions is a basic function of the inclusive imagination. So, we should expect the transmission of force and liveliness from our impression to our idea of the two billiard balls colliding, and the second one’s starting to move. As a result, our idea becomes a belief.

Hume writes that probabilities are “deriv’d from the same origin”—that is, from the same basic functions of the inclusive imagination—as proofs (T 1.3.11.1; SBN 124). In the Treatise, he distinguishes three kinds of probability: the probability of chances; the probability of causes; and probability arising from analogy (T 1.3.11.3, 1.3.12.25; SBN 124–5, 142). We rely on the probability of chances and the probability of causes when we do not have a large, uniform body of past experience concerning the matters of fact about which we are reasoning. For example, when I roll a fair, six-sided die, I do not have a uniform body of past experience concerning which face will land uppermost: in my past experience, rolling the die has sometimes been followed by one face landing uppermost, sometimes by another face landing uppermost. But if the die has four faces marked with squares, and only two marked with circles, I come to believe with some confidence that one of the faces marked with a square will land uppermost; this belief derives from the probability of chances. Similarly, when I take acetaminophen in the hopes of curing my headache, I do not have a uniform body of past experience concerning the curing of my headache: in my past experience, taking acetaminophen has usually been followed by the curing of a headache—but not always. Again, I come to believe with some confidence that taking acetaminophen on this occasion will be followed by the curing of my headache; this belief derives from the probability of causes. Hume argues that, like proofs, both the probability of chances and that of causes are explained by the association of ideas and the transmission of force and vivacity between associated perceptions.

We rely on probability arising from analogy when we observe a matter of fact that bears some resemblance, but not a perfect resemblance, to matters of fact that we have previously observed. Suppose that I have a large body of past experience of Labradors in which, whenever a Labrador has approached me with its tail wagging, it has then greeted me effusively; suppose, also, that I have no past experience of German Shepherds, but that I now see one approaching me with its tail wagging. Because this German Shepherd does not perfectly resemble anything that I have previously experienced, I do not have a proof that it will greet me effusively. But, because it bears some resemblance to the Labradors that I have experienced, I believe with some confidence that it will greet me effusively. According to Hume, this belief is due to probability arising from analogy—in this case, the analogy between the German Shepherd that I now experience and the Labradors that I have previously experienced. Hume holds that this species of probability is explained by the same basic functions of the inclusive imagination as proofs, the probability of chances, and the probability of causes (T 1.3.12.25; SBN 142). In the first Enquiry, Hume does not class analogy as a third species of probability; instead, he writes that all probable reasoning—including proofs, as well as probabilities—is “founded on a species of Analogy” (E 9.1; SBN 104).

When we carry out simple pieces of probable reasoning, we do so reflexively. For example, when we see one billiard ball hurtling towards another, we immediately form the belief that the balls will collide, and that the second will start to move; we need not reflect on our past experiences, or construct an argument, in order to do so. Not all probable reasoning is like this. More sophisticated pieces of probable reasoning are reflective, not reflexive: they involve reflection on past experience, and the construction of arguments. (For the “reflexive/reflective” distinction, see Owen 1999, 149–50.) But Hume explains this reflective kind of probable reasoning in terms of the reflexive kind. In order to carry out reflective probable reasoning, we need to establish general principles to serve as premises in our arguments, such as “the principle, that like objects, plac’d in like circumstances, will always produce like effects” (T 1.3.8.14; SBN 105; see also T 1.3.12.7–12; SBN 133–5). And we cannot begin to establish such principles, except by means of reflexive probable reasoning. For example, we reflexively believe that like objects in like circumstances will produce like effects because “we have many millions [of experiments] to convince us of this principle,” and so “this principle has establish’d itself by a sufficient custom” (ibid.).

So, Hume explains sophisticated, reflective probable reasoning by showing how it is built up from unsophisticated, reflexive probable reasoning; and, as we have seen, he explains unsophisticated, reflexive probable reasoning in terms of two basic functions of the inclusive imagination: association and the transmission of force and liveliness. In Hume’s view, then, we can conduct sophisticated research in the empirical sciences only thanks to the inclusive imagination and its basic functions.

Hume’s main discussions of proofs are Treatise Book I, Part 3, Sections 4–7; the “Abstract” of the Treatise, paragraphs 8–23; and the first Enquiry, Sections 4 and 5. His main discussions of probabilities are Treatise Book 1, Part 3, Sections 11–13; and the first Enquiry, Section 6.

c. Sympathy

In Hume’s view, to “sympathize” is to share the feelings of a person whom one encounters. At the sight of a cheerful face, one tends to feel more cheerful oneself. Similarly, at the sight of an angry or sorrowful face, one’s own mood is dampened. In each case, a sentiment or feeling of the person observed is communicated, by sympathy, to the observer.

Hume’s account of sympathy resembles that of probable reasoning in two ways. First, he explains sympathy in terms of the same two basic imaginative functions: association and the transmission of force and vivacity among associated perceptions. Second, as with probable reasoning, Hume distinguishes reflexive and reflective forms of sympathy.

Consider an example of the reflexive form of sympathy: you meet a joyful person, and consequently feel the passion of joy yourself. Hume distinguishes two components within this process. First, a piece of probable reasoning: you observe the effects of joy in the other person’s voice and gestures; from your observation of these effects, you infer the presence of joy in her mind (T 2.1.11.3, 3.3.1.7; SBN 317, 575–6). This first component explains why you should come to believe in the presence of joy in the other person’s mind. But it does not yet explain why you should come to feel the passion of joy yourself. This explanation comes from the second component that Hume discerns in the process of sympathizing. He claims that you always have a very forceful and vivacious perception of yourself (T 2.1.11.4; SBN 317). Since you are both human beings, the joyful person whom you have met resembles you closely, and—in the case we are now considering—she and the joy that she feels are contiguous to you in space and time. Thanks to these relations of resemblance and contiguity, your very forceful and lively perception of yourself is associated with your idea of this other person and the joy that she feels. Thanks to the inclusive imagination’s basic function of transmitting force and vivacity among associated perceptions, your idea of the other person’s joy receives an extra dose of force and vivacity from your perception of yourself. Your idea of the other person’s joy therefore becomes an impression of joy—that is, it becomes an actual instance of the passion of joy (T 2.1.11.5–7; SBN 319). In Hume’s view, this is the process by which we come to sympathetically share the passions or feelings of other people. As we can see, it involves the same two basic imaginative functions twice over: association and the transmission of force and vivacity among associated perceptions explain both the initial piece of probable reasoning that produces an idea of the other person’s passion, and the extra dose of force and vivacity that this idea receives, which turns it into a passion.

Hume argues that our moral sentiments—the approval that we feel when considering someone’s virtues, and the disapproval when considering her vices—derive from sympathy (T 3.3.1.6–26; SBN 575–89). When we consider somebody with a character-trait that is useful to those around her—generosity, for example—we sympathetically share the pleasurable passions of joy and gratitude that this character-trait induces in the people who benefit from it. Because we share these pleasurable passions, we morally approve of the character-trait that causes them.

If all our sympathetic responses were reflexive, however, then our sentiments of moral approval and disapproval would fluctuate wildly. As people become more distant from us in space and time, our ideas of them and their passions become less strongly associated with our forceful and vivacious perceptions of ourselves; we therefore sympathize less strongly with them. So, if all of our moral sentiments derived from reflexive sympathy, we would not approve as much of past virtues as we do of present ones, and we would not approve as much of the virtues of spatially distant people as we do of the virtues of people living close to us. However, our moral sentiments do not in fact fluctuate in these ways: “we give the same approbation to the same moral qualities in China as in England” (T 3.3.1.14; SBN 581). Hume explains that this is because our moral sentiments derive from a more sophisticated form of sympathy, in which we “correct” our sentiments by a kind of “reflection” (T 3.3.1.17; SBN 583). When we sympathize in this reflective way, we consider only the ways in which a person’s character tends to affect the people with whom she interacts—“those, who have any commerce with the person we consider” (T 3.3.1.18; SBN 583). We base our moral sentiments not on how reflexive sympathy makes us feel, but on how reflective sympathy tells us that we would feel, if we were to encounter the person whose character we are evaluating, and the people whom she directly affects.

Hume holds that the reflective kind of sympathy from which our moral sentiments derive is a corrected form of reflexive sympathy; and, as we have seen, he explains reflexive sympathy in terms of two basic functions of the inclusive imagination—association and the transmission of force and liveliness. In Hume’s view at the time of writing the Treatise, then, we owe our moral sentiments, like our capacities for abstract thought and probable reasoning, to the imagination and its basic functions.

Hume’s main discussions of sympathy are in Treatise Book 2, Part 1, Section 11; and Book 3, Part 3, Section 1. In his Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (hereafter, second Enquiry), Hume does not discuss sympathy as extensively, or in as much detail, as he does in the earlier Treatise. This leads some commentators to think that he changed his views about the origins of our moral sentiments, in between writing these works. Abramson (2001) argues convincingly that this is not the case, and that the imaginative mechanism of reflective sympathy plays much the same role in the second Enquiry as it does in the Treatise.

d. Projection

In Hume’s view, when we think that one thing causes another, we take there to be a “necessary connexion” between the cause and its effect. Given that the cause happens, we take it that the effect must follow. For example, given that a speeding billiard ball collides with an unobstructed, stationary ball, the latter must start moving; or, given that a burning match is applied to dry kindling in an oxygen-rich environment, the kindling must start burning. Hume investigates at length how we acquire the idea of this necessary connection between cause and effect, and what this idea really represents. He argues that this idea does not represent anything that belongs to, or exists between, the cause and effect themselves. Instead, it represents a feature of our minds: “an internal impression of the mind, or a determination to carry our thoughts from one object to another” (T 1.3.14.20; SBN 165). The “determination” of which Hume writes here is the transition involved in reflexive probable reasoning. By calling this transition an impression, Hume suggests that it has a distinctive feeling—when we see one billiard ball strike another, we feel ourselves determined to believe that the second ball will start moving. When we think or speak of two events as if they were necessarily connected—for example, when we say that a billiard ball must start moving, given that another ball has struck it—we are “spreading” this feeling of determination, which exists in our own mind, onto the events themselves:

’Tis a common observation, that the mind has a great propensity to spread itself on external objects, and to conjoin with them any internal impressions, which they occasion, and which always make their appearance at the same time that these objects discover themselves to the senses. Thus . . . we suppose necessity and power to lie in the objects we consider, not in our mind, that considers them; notwithstanding it is not possible for us to form the most distant idea of that quality, when it is not taken for the determination of the mind, to pass from the idea of an object to that of its usual attendant. (T 1.3.14.25; SBN 167)

Scholars often express this claim in terms of projection: in Hume’s view, they say, we project our psychological determination to expect one event, given that another has taken place, onto the causally related events themselves. Hence, some scholars say that Hume holds a projectivist view of causal necessity (for example, see Beebee 2006).

Hume indicates that two basic functions of the inclusive imagination explain why we project our impression, or determination, onto the causally related events themselves. The first is association. Our impression or determination occurs at around the same time as the causally related events (in Hume’s language, it is contiguous to them in time), and it is caused by the first of these events—we are determined to expect motion in the second billiard ball because we see the first ball hurtling towards it. Because of this contiguity and this causal relation, the causally related events come to be associated with our impression or determination. The second basic function involved in projection is our propensity to complete the union of related objects: because the causally related events are temporally contiguous with, and cause, our impression or determination, our imagination tends to “feign” a relation of spatial contiguity between them as well (T 1.4.5.12; SBN 237–8). In other words, we complete the union between the causally related objects, on the one hand, and our internal impression or determination, on the other, by imagining that the internal impression occurs outside our mind, in the very place where the causally related events are located. That is to say, we project that internal impression onto those events.

Hume makes similar-sounding appeals to projection elsewhere in his philosophical works. For example, he writes that “taste”—the faculty which gives us our sentiments of aesthetic beauty and deformity, and of moral vice and virtue—“has a productive faculty, and gilding or staining all natural objects with the colours, borrowed from internal sentiment, raises in a manner a new creation” (second Enquiry, Appendix 1, paragraph 21). This leads some commentators to say that our aesthetic and moral evaluations involve projection, in Hume’s view: when we think of something as beautiful, or of someone as morally vicious, we are projecting our internal sentiments onto them. Hume does not explain how these aesthetic and moral kinds of projection occur. But, as he aims to explain human mental phenomena systematically, by appeal to a small number of basic principles, he is likely to explain them by means of the basic imaginative functions that he uses to explain why we project our internal impression of causal necessity.

Even among those scholars who agree that Hume gives projectivist theories of causation, morality, and aesthetics, there are disagreements about exactly what he understands projection to be, and what his projectivism implies. For example, some scholars think that projection is a kind of error that we make, while others think that projection need not involve any kind of error. For a second example, some scholars think that Hume’s projectivist theories of causal necessity and moral value are, in some sense, anti-realist—in other words, these theories imply that causal necessity and moral value are, in some sense, not real features of the world—while others think that his projectivism is consistent with a realist view of the projected features. For a helpful discussion of projection in general, and of Hume’s use of projection in particular, see Kail (2007).

The main texts that have inspired projectivist interpretations of Hume are Treatise Book 1, Part 3, Section 14, especially paragraphs 20–29; and Appendix 1 of the second Enquiry.

5. Fictions of the Imagination

a. Fictions in Hume’s Science of Man

Hume’s science of man aims to explain the most general beliefs and ways of thinking that we adopt in the course of ordinary life and in philosophical reflection. Often, Hume concludes that these beliefs and ways of thinking are not products of demonstrative or probable reasoning but, instead, are fictions produced by the exclusive imagination. According to him, the fictions that we form in ordinary (or “vulgar”) life include our belief in aggregates that have “unity” or oneness, such as one crowd, an aggregate of people; our belief that certain objects persist through time without changing; and our belief, of sensible objects like coffee cups, table, and chairs, that they continue to exist at times when nobody perceives them. Hume thinks that, in the course of philosophical reflection, we tend to form further fictions. For example, when we reflect philosophically on our sensory experiences, we come to believe that the only objects truly “present to” our minds are impressions and ideas, but that some of our impressions are caused by and represent external, material objects; Hume regards belief in these external, represented objects as a new fiction. As well as calling these beliefs fictions, Hume calls the distinctive imaginative process or operation that produces them fiction (for example, see T 1.2.3.11 and 1.4.2.29; SBN 37 and 200–201). This double use of the term “fiction” is in keeping with ordinary eighteenth century English usage. Johnson’s 1755–6 Dictionary of the English Language shows that, in eighteenth century English, the term “fiction” could mean both “the thing feigned or invented” (hence, Hume applies the term to certain ideas and beliefs) and “the act of feigning or inventing” (hence, Hume applies the term to the imaginative processes responsible for those ideas and beliefs).

Evidently, Hume thinks that many of our beliefs are fictions of the imagination. Fictions are so important within his science of man, one commentator suggests, that “what is commonly called Hume’s theory of impressions and ideas ought to be called the theory of impressions, ideas, and fictions” (Traiger 1987, 381). But it is hard to interpret Hume’s views about fictions. He suggests that fictions involve “apply[ing]” an idea to an object or impression from which we cannot derive that idea, and that this is an “improper” and “inexact” way of using that idea (T 1.2.3.11; SBN 37). But it is not clear what this means: in what sense do fictions involve an improper and inexact use of our ideas? Different commentators answer this question in different ways. According to some, Hume sees all fictions as falsehoods. According to others, he allows that some fictions may be true, but thinks that we lack evidence or justification for believing them. According to others still, he sees fictions as incoherent or unintelligible; if this is correct, then fictions may not be genuine ideas or beliefs, but pseudo-ideas or -beliefs, in Hume’s view. Of course, it is possible to combine these interpretations by distinguishing different kinds of fictions: for example, we may interpret Hume as thinking that some fictions are falsehoods, while others are unintelligible.

The rest of this section briefly examines three of the most important fictions that Hume discusses. It aims to exhibit the features of his discussions that motivate each type of interpretation that we have just surveyed. Hume’s discussions of these fictions are in Treatise Book 1, Part 4, Sections 2 and 3.

b. The “Vulgar” Fiction of a Continued Existence

In the Treatise section “Of scepticism with regard to the senses,” Hume tries to explain how we come to believe in bodies, or material objects, that continue to exist at times when nobody perceives them. He thinks that this belief can take two different forms: a “vulgar” or ordinary form, and a “philosophical” form. Hume thinks that the only things “present to the mind” are perceptions, or impressions and ideas (T 1.2.6.8, T Abs 5; SBN 67, 647). But ordinarily, he thinks, we do not realize this. Instead, we take certain of our sense-impressions to be bodies—that is, we ordinarily believe, of certain sense-impressions, that they continue to exist at times when they are not present to our minds (T 1.4.2.31, 1.4.2.36; SBN 202, 205). Hume calls this “vulgar” belief “the fiction of a continu’d existence” (T 1.4.2.36; SBN 205).

According to Hume, the main reason why we entertain this “vulgar” fiction is the “constancy” of certain sense-impressions before and after an interruption in our experiences (T 1.4.2.23; SBN 198–9). Suppose that I shut my eyes for a moment and that, upon re-opening them, I receive sense-impressions of the furniture in the room that closely resemble those that I received before shutting my eyes. Because of this resemblance or “constancy,” when I recall the earlier impressions, I naturally recall the later impressions, too: my mind “readily passes from one to the other,” due to the association of ideas of resembling objects. Thanks to a complicated imaginative mechanism, which Hume describes over several pages, this association of ideas leads me to imaginatively fill the gap in the sequence of sense-impressions that I received: I imaginatively construct ideas of furniture existing during the time when my eyes were shut, connecting up my memories of the last furniture-impression that I received before shutting my eyes and the first one that I received after re-opening them (T 1.4.2.31–40; SBN 201–8). Because these imaginatively constructed ideas are associated with memories, a high degree of force and vivacity is transmitted to them (T 1.4.2.41–42; SBN 208–9). Thanks to this mechanism, which involves both the association of ideas and the transmission of force and vivacity among related perceptions, I ordinarily come to believe, of my furniture-impressions, that they continued to exist while my eyes were shut.

However, Hume argues that none of our sense-impressions continue to exist at times when they are not present to our minds (T 1.4.2.44–45; SBN 210–11). When I shut my eyes, the furniture-impressions that were present to my mind cease to exist; when I re-open my eyes, new furniture-impressions are created in my mind, which are similar, but not numerically identical, to the earlier ones. So, the “vulgar” fiction of a continued existence is false, according to Hume. This is consistent with an interpretation on which Hume thinks that all fictions are falsehoods; however, it is also consistent with one on which Hume thinks that only some fictions are falsehoods, while others are unjustified beliefs or unintelligible pseudo-beliefs.

c. The Philosophical Fiction of Double Existence

Numerous Early Modern philosophers shared Hume’s view that only perceptions are ever “present to the mind,” but also held that we perceive bodies that continue to exist at times when nobody perceives them. These philosophers thought that we can perceive bodies by means of certain sense-impressions, because these impressions are caused by bodies, and represent those bodies to us. Hume calls this philosophical theory of how bodies are perceived the “opinion of a double existence of perceptions and objects” (T 1.4.2.46; SBN 211), because the theory posits two kinds of existent things: “perceptions,” or impressions that represent bodies to us; and “objects,” the bodies that are represented by (and in that sense are the “objects” of) our impressions.

Hume argues that this theory of double existence is “a new fiction,” due to the exclusive imagination, like the “vulgar” fiction that it replaces (T 1.4.2.52; SBN 215). However, he does not say that this new, philosophical fiction of double existence is false. Instead, he emphasizes that we cannot reason our way to believing it. We believe it only due to the exclusive imagination. This suggests that Hume regards the fiction of double existence as a belief that is unjustified, or inadequately supported by our evidence for it, but that may nonetheless be true.

d. The Philosophical Fiction of an Underlying Substance

Hume thinks that an ordinary sensible object, like a peach or melon, is just an aggregate of sensible qualities: for example, a ripe peach is an aggregate of a yellow-orange color, a fuzzy texture, solidity, and a sweet smell and taste (T 1.4.3.2, 1.4.3.5; SBN 219, 221). However, he thinks that we are prone to suppose otherwise. Instead of taking a peach to be an aggregate of many sensible qualities, we take it to be one thing. This leads to a kind of philosophical puzzlement: how can many things (the many aggregated qualities) also be one thing—isn’t this an “evident contradiction” (T 1.4.3.2; SBN 219)? According to Hume, many philosophers have responded to this puzzle by supposing that a peach is not the same thing as its sensible qualities, but is instead “an unknown something”—a substance or substratum that underlies its sensible qualities, and in which those qualities exist. The presence of this “unknown something,” underlying the sensible qualities, is what gives the peach “a title to be call’d one thing” (T 1.4.3.5; SBN 221).

Hume thinks that this underlying substance or “unknown something” is a fiction, characteristic of ancient philosophy (T 1.4.3.1, 1.4.3.5; SBN 219, 221). It is “feign[ed],” or postulated, by the exclusive imagination. Hume also calls this fiction an “unintelligible chimera” (T 1.4.3.7; SBN 222). Elsewhere, he explains the sense in which it is unintelligible. All of our ideas are copied from our impressions, or are made up of ideas that are so copied. But an underlying substance is supposed to be an entirely different kind of thing from an impression. So, we cannot form an idea of an underlying substance (T 1.4.5.3; SBN 232–3).

Does this mean that we cannot think about underlying substances at all? When Hume introduces the concept of an idea, he equates having ideas with thinking. This suggests that the answer is yes—the fact that we cannot form an idea of an underlying substance does mean that we cannot think about such substances at all.

However, other things that Hume says cast doubt on this interpretation. He seems to posit several different fictions that cannot be made up of ideas copied from impressions. For example, the “unintelligible” fiction of an underlying substance differs from the “incomprehensible” fiction of a perfect standard of equality (T 1.2.4.24; SBN 47–49). But how can entertaining one of these fictions differ from entertaining the other if, in each case, we have no thought at all about the thing that we are feigning, or fictitiously representing? Some commentators solve this puzzle by pointing to passages where Hume seems to distinguish two kinds of imaginative thought: conceiving and supposing (T 1.2.6.8–9, 1.4.2.56; SBN 67–68, 218). Hume seems to equate conceiving with forming ideas (T 1.2.2.8; SBN 32). This leaves open the possibility that supposing is a kind of imaginative thought that does not involve forming ideas. If this is Hume’s view, then he can allow that we can think about underlying substances and perfect standards of equality by making suppositions about them, even though we cannot conceive them or form ideas that represent them. For an interpretation of this kind, see Wilbanks (1968). For a helpful discussion of the problem posed by “unintelligible” fictions, and a creative solution, see Loeb (2002: chapter 5, esp. 162–72).

6. Imaginability and Possibility

Hume holds that whatever can be clearly (and, he sometimes adds, distinctly) conceived is possible. Scholars often call this his Conceivability Principle. Superficially, it resembles a principle that Descartes accepts: “everything which I clearly and distinctly understand is capable of being created by God so as to correspond exactly with my understanding of it” (Descartes, Sixth Meditation; CSM 2:54). But there are important differences between them. In Descartes’s view, our clearest and most distinct conceptions are due to our “pure understanding” or “pure intellect”—a faculty by which we form completely non-sensory, non-imagistic ideas—whereas “our sensory grasp” of things “is in many cases . . . obscure and confused” (Sixth Meditation; CSM 2:55); see section (2e) above. Therefore, in his Meditations, Descartes aims to help his readers achieve clear and distinct conceptions of the soul and the body by leading their minds away from the senses and imagination (as he explains in the Synopsis to the Meditations). In contrast, Hume writes that our impressions—the perceptions that our internal and external senses present to our minds—are “clear and evident” (T 1.2.3.1; SBN 33). And he equates clear and distinct conceivability with imaginability, as this passage makes clear:

’Tis an establish’d maxim in metaphysics, that whatever the mind clearly conceives includes the idea of possible existence, or in other words, that nothing we imagine is absolutely impossible. (T 1.2.2.8; SBN 32, italics in original)

Unlike Descartes’s principle, then, Hume’s Conceivability Principle means that whatever can be clearly (and distinctly) imagined is possible. (Hume does not specify whether he has the inclusive or exclusive imagination in mind. Likely, he thinks that any clear idea formed in the inclusive imagination—be it by reason, or by the exclusive imagination—represents something that is possible.)

Hume uses his Conceivability Principle as a premise in several of his most important arguments. For example, he uses it to argue that the proposition “whatever has a beginning has also a cause of existence” is “neither intuitively nor demonstrably certain” (T 1.3.3.2–3; SBN 79–80). Only necessary truths—truths that could not have been false—are intuitively or demonstrably certain. But, Hume claims, we can clearly imagine something starting to exist without a cause. Together with his Conceivability Principle, this implies that it is possible that something should start to exist without a cause. It follows that the proposition “whatever has a beginning has also a cause of existence” is not a necessary truth (it could have been false); hence, it is neither intuitively nor demonstrably certain. Hume argues in a similar way, using his Conceivability Principle, that no demonstrative argument can prove that nature is uniform (T 1.3.6.5; SBN 89), and that we cannot conceive of a real “necessary connexion” between a cause and its effect (T 1.3.14.13; SBN 161–2).

Hume’s claims about imaginability and possibility raise two main interpretive questions. First, whose ability clearly to imagine something guarantees that it is possible: an ordinary human being, like you or me, or an ideal human being, whose mind is in perfect working order and who has a large stock of simple ideas to use in forming her clear and distinct conceptions? Second, in addition to accepting that whatever can be clearly imagined is possible, does Hume also accept that whatever cannot be clearly imagined is impossible? This “Inconceivability Principle” seems indefensible to many philosophers, but one paragraph in the Treatise suggests that Hume nonetheless accepts it (T 1.2.2.8; SBN 32).

In his Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man, Hume’s contemporary Thomas Reid presented several objections to the principle what whatever is conceivable is possible (Essay 4, Chapter 3). He regards Hume as one of the targets of these objections. However, Reid agrees with Hume that we cannot distinctly imagine the impossible (Essay 5, Chapter 6). The disagreement between them really concerns whether there is a form of clear conception other than clear imagining: Hume thinks that there is not; Reid thinks that there is, and that this non-imaginative form of conception allows us clearly to conceive impossibilities.

7. The Imagination and Hume’s Skepticism

In the concluding section of Treatise Book 1, Hume professes himself “a sceptic” (T 1.4.7.15; SBN 274). In his “Abstract” of the Treatise, he describes the philosophy that it contains as “very sceptical” (T Abs 27; SBN 657). In the first Enquiry, he presents what he calls “sceptical doubts about the operations of the understanding” (E 4) and a “sceptical solution of these doubts” (E 5); and he concludes this work by endorsing what he calls “mitigated scepticism” (E 12.24–34; SBN 161–5). The questions of what Hume’s skepticism consists in, and whether this skepticism is compatible with his program of establishing a “science of man,” are some of the most central—and most contested—questions in Hume scholarship.

Skepticism appears in the titles of two Treatise sections and three sections of the first Enquiry. In four of these five sections, Hume argues that “reason” cannot carry out a certain function, and that this function therefore falls to “the imagination.” In the Treatise section “Of scepticism with regard to reason” (T 1.4.1), he argues that our faculty of reason cannot explain why we believe the conclusions of our reasoning; were it not for a feature of the imagination, our confidence in our conclusions would be destroyed by the thought of our own fallibility (T 1.4.1.9–12; SBN 184–7). In “Of scepticism with regard to the senses” (T 1.4.2), he argues that reason cannot explain how we come to believe in the continued and distinct existence of sensible objects, at times when nobody perceives them (T 1.4.2.14; SBN 193). Instead, that belief must derive from the imagination and its fictions (T 1.4.2.15–55; SBN 194–217); for discussion, see sections (5b) and (5c), above. In the Enquiry sections “Sceptical doubts concerning the operations of the understanding” (E 4) and “Sceptical solution of these doubts” (E 5), he argues that our beliefs about unobserved things are “not founded on reasoning, or any process of the understanding” (E 4.15; SBN 32) and, instead, that these beliefs are due to the association of perceptions in the imagination (E 5.11, 5.14; SBN 48, 50–51).

This suggests that Hume’s skepticism has something important to do with the demotion of reason, and the promotion of the imagination, as explanatory factors in his science of man. In order to determine exactly what this skepticism consists in, we must determine what Hume means by the terms “reason” and “the imagination” in the sections of his works that present his skeptical arguments. Scholars are divided on this matter, and the rest of this section briefly surveys the main interpretive issues. It focuses on Hume’s claim that our beliefs about the unobserved are not founded on reasoning, but are due to imaginative association; hereafter, let us call this “Hume’s Skeptical Claim.” (Those seeking to interpret Hume’s claims about reason and the imagination in his other skeptical arguments will face issues similar to the ones discussed here.)

One issue is whether, in Hume’s Skeptical Claim, the terms “reason” and “the imagination” express Hume’s own distinction between the two parts or sub-faculties of the inclusive imagination: reason, understood as the sub-faculty responsible for demonstrative and probable reasoning; and the exclusive imagination, understood as the sub-faculty responsible for whimsies, prejudices, and various fictions (T 1.3.9.19n22; SBN 118; for discussion, see sections (2a)–(2c), above). Some scholars think that these terms do express Hume’s distinction” (in keeping with the wording of this paragraph’s first sentence). If they are right, then Hume’s Skeptical Claim means that our beliefs about the unobserved are not founded on demonstrative or probable reasoning. (This might make Hume’s views seem paradoxical, because he often says that our beliefs about the unobserved are produced by probable reasoning—in fact, he says that the mental process responsible for these beliefs is “not only a true species of reasoning, but the strongest of all others,” [T 1.3.7.5n20; SBN 97n]. But these scholars will interpret Hume’s phrase “founded on” in such a way that beliefs can be produced by probable reasoning without being founded on probable reasoning.)

Other scholars think that Hume’s Skeptical Claim does not concern his distinction between reason and the exclusive imagination, but some other distinction. On one version of this proposal, Hume means to contrast reason, as his opponents conceived it with the inclusive imagination, as he conceives it. Hume’s opponents thought that reasoning involved mental events or processes that are both rational and explanatorily basic; see section (2e) above. Perhaps Hume’s Skeptical Claim means that reason, conceived in his opponents’ way, cannot explain our beliefs about unobserved things; hence, these beliefs must instead be explained by the inclusive imagination—specifically, by the sub-faculty of the inclusive imagination by which we carry out demonstrative and probable reasoning.

If these scholars are correct, then we face a second interpretive issue: exactly what conception of reason is at stake in Hume’s Skeptical Claim? Scholars have made numerous proposals, including a “rationalist” conception of reason as deduction; a Lockean conception of reason as the finding of “intermediate ideas”; and reason as a faculty of rational perception, which encompasses sensation and intuition, as well as reasoning.

A third interpretive issue is whether Hume’s Skeptical Claim is supposed to be a normative claim—that is, a claim involving some evaluation of our beliefs about the unobserved—or a purely descriptive claim about the mechanism that produces these beliefs. According to a traditional interpretation, Hume’s Skeptical Claim is normative, and it means that we have no justification at all for our beliefs about the unobserved: hence, that none of these beliefs is in better standing than any other. On this traditional interpretation, then, Hume understands the imagination to be a source of completely unjustified beliefs. (Whether this applies to the inclusive imagination, or just to the exclusive imagination, will depend on how we settle the first interpretive issue, above.) This interpretation was popular in the mid-twentieth century but, since the 1970s, it has been subject to numerous challenges and is now a minority view. Perhaps the most serious challenge to it is that Hume endorses some beliefs about the unobserved, while criticizing others: for example, he endorses his own claim that all simple ideas—even those that he has not observed—are copied from simple impressions; but he criticizes beliefs in miracles (E 10). It is not clear how he could do this, if he thought that all beliefs about the unobserved were equally devoid of justification.

For this and other reasons, some late twentieth and early twenty-first century scholars argue that Hume’s Skeptical Claim is a purely descriptive claim about the mental process by which we form these beliefs, with no implications about our justification for them. Others argue for an intermediate interpretation, which says that Hume’s Skeptical Claim is normative, but does not completely rule out all forms of justification for our beliefs about the unobserved. For example, according to some, Hume means to say that our beliefs about the unobserved are not justified by means of rational insight, while allowing that certain of these beliefs might be justified by some other means. These purely descriptive and intermediate interpretations both allow that the imagination may be a source of justified beliefs, in Hume’s view. (Again, whether the relevant sense of “imagination” is inclusive or exclusive depends on how we settle the first interpretive issue, above.)

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources by Hume

Hume’s theory of the imagination informs much of his thinking about human mental and social phenomena, so almost all of his works are relevant to this theory. The most relevant are:

Hume, David. A Treatise of Human Nature, Vol. 1: The Text. Ed. by David Fate Norton and Mary J. Norton (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2007). [Cited as “T,” followed by book, part, section and paragraph numbers, followed by corresponding page number in L. A. Selby-Bigge and P. H. Nidditch’s 1978 edition of the Treatise, set off by “SBN.”]
- In this early work, first published 1739–40, Hume develops a theory of the imagination and uses it to explain an enormous range of cognitive, passionate, and social phenomena.
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Ed. by Tom L. Beauchamp (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1998). [Cited as “E,” followed by section and paragraph numbers, followed by the corresponding page number in L. A. Selby-Bigge and P. H. Nidditch’s 1975 edition of Hume’s Enquiries, set off by “SBN.”]
- Recasts some of Treatise Book 1, including its accounts of the origins and association of ideas, and its central arguments about probable reasoning and causation.
Hume, David. A Dissertation on the Passions; The Natural History of Religion. Ed. by Tom L. Beauchamp (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2007).
- The Dissertation recasts Hume’s discussion of the passions from Treatise Book 2, including his theory of the “double association” of impressions and ideas. The Natural History of Religion uses Hume’s theory of the imagination to explain how human beings first came to have religious beliefs.

b. Primary Sources by Other Early Modern Philosophers

The following Early Modern works are especially helpful to read in connection with Hume’s theory of the imagination:

Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. Two vols. Trans. and ed. by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1985). [Cited as “CSM,” followed by volume and page number]
- For Descartes’s early views on the imagination, see the Rules for the Direction of the Mind, especially Rule 12 (CSM 1:39–51). For his mature views, see especially The Passions of the Soul, Part 1, articles 19–21 (CSM 1:335–6), and the Second, Fifth and Sixth Meditations (all in CSM 2).
Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Volume III: The Correspondence. Trans. and ed. by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch, and Anthony Kenny (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1991). [Cited as “CSMK,” followed by page number.]
- Several of Descartes’s letters clarify his views of the imagination in helpful ways. See, especially, his letters to Mersenne of 16 June, 1641 (CSMK 183–4), July 1641 (CSMK 184–7) and 22 July, 1641 (CSMK 187); his letter to “Hyperaspistes” of August 1641 (CSMK 188–97); and his letter to Princess Elizabeth of 28 June, 1643 (CSMK 226–9).
Hobbes, Thomas. Leviathan. In The English Works of Thomas Hobbes, vol. 3. Ed. by Sir William Molesworth (London: John Bohn, 1839).
- Hume’s views of the imagination are likely indebted to Hobbes. See especially chapters 2 and 3 of Leviathan.
Malebranche, Nicolas. The Search after Truth. Trans. and ed. by Thomas M. Lennon and Paul J. Olscamp (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997).
- Malebranche presents his views of the imagination in Book 2 of The Search after Truth. Book 2, Part 1, Chapter 5; and Book 2, Part 2, Chapter 2 provide especially helpful background to Hume’s views about the imagination—especially his theory of association.
Reid, Thomas. Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man. Ed. by Derek Brookes (University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, 2002).
- Hume’s contemporary Thomas Reid criticized Hume’s theory of the imagination on numerous fronts. Many of his criticisms are contained here. On Hume’s theory of the imagination, see especially Essay 3, Chapter 7 (“Theories Concerning Memory”), which criticizes Hume’s way of distinguishing memory and imagination; Essay 4, Chapter 2 (“Theories Concerning Conception”), which criticizes Hume’s views of the role that representational ideas play in imagining, as Reid understood them; Essay 4, Chapter 3 (“Mistakes Concerning Conception”), which criticizes the view that whatever is conceivable is possible; and Essay 5, Chapter 6 (“Opinions of Philosophers about Universals”), which criticizes Hume’s view of abstract ideas and the arguments he gives in support of it.

c. Secondary Sources

The secondary literature on Hume is enormous and, because his theory of the imagination is so central to his science of man, much of the literature is relevant to it. Here is a selection of especially relevant and helpful contributions.

Abramson, Kate. “Sympathy and the Project of Hume’s Second Enquiry.” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 83.1 (2001): 45–80.
- Helpfully discusses the relationship between Hume’s views on sympathy in the Treatise and those in the second Enquiry. Presents a convincing case that the Enquiry uses the same imaginative mechanisms as the Treatise to explain our moral sentiments.
Beebee, Helen. Hume on Causation (New York: Routledge, 2006).
- Contains clear and insightful discussions of Hume’s views on demonstrative and probable reasoning, as well as on causation. Develops and defends a projectivist interpretation of his theory of causation.
Dorsch, Fabian. “Hume.” In The Routledge Handbook of Philosophy of Imagination, edited by Amy Kind, 40–54 (New York: Routledge, 2016).
- Stimulating critical discussion of Hume’s theory of the imagination and its significance for twentieth- and twenty-first-century philosophy of mind. Sketches a revised, “neo-Humean” theory of the imagination, designed to meet several objections to Hume’s own views.
Everson, Stephen. “The Difference Between Feeling and Thinking.” Mind 97.387 (1988): 401–13.
- Very clear and illuminating discussion of the properties of force and vivacity. Argues that these are functional properties of perceptions, not phenomenological ones.
Garrett, Don. Cognition and Commitment in Hume’s Philosophy (New York: Oxford University Press, 1997).
- Essential reading on Hume’s faculty psychology in general, and his theory of the imagination in particular. Chapter 1 helpfully situates Hume’s views on the imagination in relation to those of his Early Modern predecessors.
Garrett, Don. “The Literary Arts in Hume’s Science of the Fancy.” Kriterion 44.108 (2003): 161–79.
- Discusses the role of Hume’s theory of the imagination in his attempt to found a science of aesthetic criticism. Read together with the opening chapters of Cognition and Commitment in Hume’s Philosophy, this makes an excellent introduction to Hume’s theory of the imagination.
Grene, Marjorie. “The Objects of Hume’s Treatise.” Hume Studies 20.2 (1994): 163–77.
- Helpfully surveys the ways in which Hume uses the term “object” (as in his Separability Principle, that whatever objects are distinct are distinguishable, and that whatever objects are distinguishable are separable by the thought and imagination). Identifies three senses of “object” in the Treatise: i) targets of attention, or intentional objects; ii) impressions; iii) non-mental, external objects.
Kail, P. J. E. Projection and Realism in Hume’s Philosophy (New York: Oxford University Press, 2007).
- This is a book-length study of Hume’s account of projection and his use of this imaginative function to explain belief in the external world, religious belief, belief in causal necessity, and moral belief. Contains much helpful discussion of the imagination and its relation to our other cognitive faculties.
Loeb, Louis E. Stability and Justification in Hume’s Treatise (New York: Oxford University Press, 2002).
- A novel and provocative interpretation of Hume’s epistemology. Contains much insightful discussion of his associationist theories of probable reasoning and sympathy, and of imaginative fictions.
Lightner, D. Tycerium. “Hume on Conceivability and Inconceivability.” Hume Studies 23.1 (1997): 113–32.
- Argues that Hume’s Conceivability Principle concerns our actual ability to conceive, given our actual stock of simple ideas; and that Hume does not accept the Inconceivability Principle.
Owen, David. Hume’s Reason (New York: Oxford University Press, 1999).
- Essential reading on Hume’s attempt to explain reasoning in terms of more basic imaginative functions; also includes helpful discussions of Descartes’s and Locke’s theories of reasoning, and Hume’s relationship to them.
Traiger, Saul. “Impressions, Ideas, and Fictions.” Hume Studies 13.2 (1987): 381–99.
- Influential discussion of Hume’s view of imaginative fictions; subsequent discussion of this important topic is largely indebted to this article.
Traiger, Saul. “Hume on Memory and Imagination.” In A Companion to Hume, edited by Elizabeth S. Radcliffe (Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2011).
- Helpful introductory discussion of Hume’s distinction between the memory and the inclusive imagination. Raises several questions about this distinction, and surveys several interpretations of it.
Wilbanks, Jan. Hume’s Theory of Imagination (The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1968).
- Devoted to Hume’s theory of the imagination. Contains a helpful survey of older interpretations. Argues that Treatise Book 1 and the first Enquiry each presents an overall argument for mitigated skepticism, in which Hume’s theory of imagination plays a central role.
Wright, John P. The Sceptical Realism of David Hume (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1983).
- Contains much valuable discussion of Hume’s theory of the imagination and its role in his accounts of causation and the external world. Especially helpful on Hume’s debt to Malebranche’s theory of the imagination.

Author Information

Jonathan Cottrell
Email: jonathan.cottrell@wayne.edu
Wayne State University
U. S. A.

John Anderson (1893-1962)

Scottish-Australian philosopher John Anderson was a passionate defender of a philosophy typically described as Realism. Anderson exercised a significant and lasting influence over several generations of students, including such later philosophers as John Passmore, J.L. Mackie, and D.M. Armstrong. These students criticised and developed several key features of Anderson’s own philosophy such as the defense of a theory of objective good, the rejection of any theory of absolute morality or imperative, and a logically rigorous approach to metaphysical questions such as causation.

The significance of this influence was primarily due to Anderson’s systematic conception of philosophy as a Realist theory of logic, ethics, and aesthetics; this was unusual because it was in a century dominated by the analytic method in philosophy. Anderson’s systematic conception of philosophy sought to provide a unified theory of the traditional subjects of philosophy freed from their association with Platonism and Idealism.

Hence Anderson advanced a doctrinal conception of metaphysics as composed of three distinct elements: an epistemology of Realism as the direct experience of things, an ontology of Empiricism as situations of objects existing independently of the relations they have, and the logical theory of Positivism as the theory that terms and propositions always refer to existing objects or situations. Further, Anderson also developed the important ethical and aesthetic theory that ‘good’ and ‘beauty’ can never be in terms of the relations that they have (for example, being valued, being obliged, being striven after, ‘expressing’ etc.) and must be qualities of natural human activities.

One of the most controversial aspects of Anderson’s ontology was his logical analysis of Space-Time and its refutation of ‘physicalist’ (that is, general relativity) assumptions about the nature of space-time. Put briefly, space-time (in Einstein’s sense) cannot have an origin or a boundary because beyond that limit or origin, there must always be more Space-Time (in Anderson’s sense). Associated with this view of existence was his theory of the categories. Developing the ideas of Samuel Alexander, Anderson argued that there were thirteen categories that are universal to all things.

Introduction
Early Systematic Realism: 1926-1937
Mature Philosophy 1939-1962
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

John Anderson was born in 1893 in the small town of Stonehouse, twenty miles south-west of Glasgow, Scotland. He attended the local school, where his father was headmaster, before enrolling at the Hamilton Academy in 1907. In 1911, he won first place in the All Scotland Bursary Competition which enabled him to study at Glasgow University from 1911 to 1917. During this time he won several prizes and awards, before graduating with an M.A. degree in philosophy in 1917. From 1917 to 1922 he worked in the philosophy departments at Glasgow University and the University of Wales, before being employed at Edinburgh University on the Shaw Fellowship from 1922 to 1926. In 1927, he was appointed Professor of Philosophy at Sydney University and, apart from a sabbatical year spent in Britain and America in 1938, he remained there until his retirement in 1958. He died in Sydney in 1962 at the age of 69.

Anderson was initially influenced by the Hegelian Idealism established at Glasgow University by Edward and John Caird and further developed by Anderson’s own teacher, Henry Jones. The distinctive form of Hegelianism developed at Glasgow University is typically described as Christian Idealism, as it emphasized the dialectical development of an organic universe culminating in the realization of God. Anderson was also influenced by other Scottish philosophers such as Robert Adamson and John Burnet, although it was the Australian philosopher, Samuel Alexander, who had the most significant and permanent impact on his philosophical development. Anderson had already been exposed to the Realist writings of the early Moore and Russell, and the work of William James and the American New Realists before he attended Alexander’s Gifford lectures at Glasgow University between 1915 and 1917. These lectures, later published as Space, Time and Deity, were to exercise such a decisive influence on Anderson that he was still lecturing on them thirty years later. [Anderson 2005, 2007i] From within the history of philosophy itself, the most significant influences on him were Heraclitus, Socrates, Plato, and Hegel. He often praised Greek objectivity with its emphasis on ‘things’ and thought that almost all of modern philosophy, with its emphasis on epistemology, was irrelevant to the systematic study of philosophy, with only Hegel and Alexander being singled out for praise from the entire modern period. [Anderson 2008i, 2008ii]

Anderson’s intellectual development was also influenced by a range of non-philosophical thinkers including James Joyce, Mathew Arnold, Sigmund Freud, Karl Marx, Georges Sorel, Giambattista Vico, Henrik Ibsen, Fyodor Dostoevsky, and Herman Melville. He was particularly well read in the Marxist and Communist literature of the early twentieth century, being familiar with the works of Engels, Lenin, Trotsky, Bukharin, Kautsky, and Stalin. While these various political and cultural influences cannot be said to fit neatly into Anderson’s overall philosophic system, his interest in these thinkers meant that his students gained an education that was much more ‘continental’ in scope than was typical at other English-speaking universities around the world at that time. In a very real sense, Anderson’s students received an education that was unique. This diverse intellectual and cultural context, when coupled with the logical discipline of his systematic philosophy, enabled many of his students to succeed in a variety of academic and non-academic occupations.

In philosophy, his students included John Passmore, J.L. Mackie, and D.M. Armstrong, whose collective work in metaphysics, ethics, and the history of philosophy, contributed greatly to the development of philosophy during the last quarter of the twentieth century. [Armstrong 2001, Passmore 1997] Apart from these luminaries, Anderson’s students who pursued careers in academic philosophy number more than thirty and comprise more than a dozen professors. These include Alec Ritchie (Professor of Philosophy), David Stove (Associate Professor of Philosophy), A.J. Baker, Bill Doniela (A/Professor of Philosophy), Sandy Anderson, Ruth Walker, Kim Lycos, Margaret Mackie, Gaius MacIntosh, George Molnar (author, Powers: a Study in Metaphysics), Alan Olding (author, Modern Biology and Natural Theology), Perce Partridge (Professor of Philosophy), Tom Rose (Associate Professor of Philosophy), Vic Dudman, Robert McLaughlin, Eric Dowling, Graham Pont, and David Dockrill.

Anderson’s students also succeeded to a number of professorial positions outside philosophy. These include Eugene Kamenka (Professor, History of Ideas), L.J. Hume (Reader, Political Science), Les Hiatt (Professor of Anthropology), Donald Horne (author, The Lucky Country), Doug McCallum (Professor of Political Science), Neil McInnes (author, The Western Marxists), Wesley Milgate (Professor of English), Bill Morison (Professor of Law), H.J. Oliver (Professor of English), Bill O’Neil (Professor of Psychology), John Ward (Professor of History), Brian Beddie (Professor of Government), Hedley Bull (Professor of International Relations), P.D. Craig (Professor of Chemistry), Rawdon Dalrymple (Professor of Government), J.A.B. Holland (Professor of Divinity), A.D. Hope (Professor of English), James McAuley (Professor of English), and R.F. Jackson (Professor of French). Studying under Anderson also enabled a great number of his students to succeed in the commercial, journalistic, and political spheres. He is widely regarded as the ‘father’ of the Sydney Push, the amorphous social and political movement that produced such significant public intellectuals as Clive James, Germaine Greer, Robert Hughes, and Barry Humphries.

Anderson’s tenure at Sydney University was a controversial one and he was twice subject to public censure: once by the Sydney University Senate, and once by the NSW Parliament. He participated in many student societies at the University and was president of the Sydney University Freethought Society for over twenty years. He was also a passionate defender of freedom of speech and thought, a critic of all forms of censorship, and an active participant in several radical political movements during his early years.

Since his death, Anderson’s philosophy has been little studied and, in general, is misunderstood. A significant reason for this state of affairs is that he only wrote journal articles during his lifetime and the greater majority of these were for the Australasian Journal of Psychology and Philosophy, which, at that time, was not widely read internationally. He was working on the publication of a collection of a selection of these articles at the time of his death and these were published posthumously as Studies in Empirical Philosophy. Over the next forty years, only two other collections of his work were published – Art and Reality dealing with aesthetics and literary criticism and Education and Inquiry dealing with education. The creation of the position of the John Anderson Research Fellow at Sydney University led to the publication of a number of editions of his lectures from 2003 to 2008, but that position has been vacant since 2008. It is not known when, or if, that position will be filled again so further publication of Anderson’s philosophy can occur.

Another difficulty in properly understanding Anderson’s philosophy is the spread of his philosophical writing during his academic career. During his first ten years at Sydney University (1927-1937), he wrote 75% of all his published articles in philosophy. Hence for the remaining twenty four years of his life (1938-1962) he wrote only 25% of his published work. This lack of publication after 1938 makes assessment of his mature philosophical position very difficult. While an irregular spread of publication over a lifetime might not always present a problem for understanding a philosopher’s theories, in Anderson’s case it is significant because in his political writings, where the same irregular publication occurs, there is a radical change in his political position: from a radical Communist in 1927 to conservative anti-Communist in 1962. He described his political writings for the decade from 1927 to 1937 as his ‘proletarian’ period, as at this time he adhered to a general Communist theory of society and political change. After 1938, he entered his ‘anti-proletarian’ period of political theorizing which was characterized by an emphasis on liberty, democracy, the importance of traditions in political life, and anti-Communism.

Given these marked changes in his political position, the question is raised whether Anderson’s philosophic views also went through any substantial changes during his lifetime. To adequately assess this claim, it is necessary to present the systematic character of Anderson’s philosophy as formulated during his first decade at Sydney University. It is during this period that Anderson’s ‘systematic Realism’ is most in evidence. The systematic nature of this philosophy can then be contrasted with the more episodic writings of the last twenty years of his life to assess whether any pronounced changes occurred in his understanding of philosophy.

2. Early Systematic Realism: 1926-1937

The most distinctive feature of John Anderson’s philosophy is that it was a systematic philosophy in a century dominated by the analytic methodology in Anglo-Saxon philosophy. System building of the sort Anderson engaged upon was frowned upon by analytic philosophers, whether of the conceptual or linguistic variety. In contrast, continental philosophers at this time were much more at ease with systematic philosophy, although the phenomenological and existential orientation of that philosophy did not fit easily with Anderson’s scientific conception of philosophy. As early as 1922, Anderson was describing his systematic philosophy as a unified theory of the ‘sciences’ of logic, ethics, and aesthetics and this characterization of his philosophy is one that he maintained into the 1930s. For Anderson, to assert that logic, ethics, or aesthetics were sciences was to assert that they were definite subjects that could be studied and that their method of study was as objective as any other science.

a. Realism

The most common term that has been used to characterize Anderson’s philosophy is that of Realism, hence the common title ‘Andersonian Realism’. During the twentieth century, Realism was primarily understood as an epistemological term that refers to the ‘real’ or ‘objective’ existence of the object of knowledge. However for Anderson, Realism was not merely an epistemological doctrine, but, based on the theory of external relations developed by the American New Realists, was a systematic enterprise – a ‘systematic Realism’ – that treated the subjects of logic, ethics, and aesthetics in a Realist manner. It should be noted that Anderson’s understanding of the term ‘logic’ was not restricted to its contemporary usage of formal logic but was more of the traditional sense of metaphysics as including epistemology, ontology, and formal logic as distinct disciplines within that subject.

b. Realist Metaphysics

In an early article, “Realism and Some of its Critics’, Anderson outlined the logic he believed that his general metaphysical system followed. He argued that Realism appears firstly as an epistemology based on the doctrine of external relations. Secondly, it appears as an ontology, which he described as Empiricist, but is more properly described as a theory of situations or spatio-temporal existence. Finally it appears as a logic which he described as Positivist, meaning by that term, not the Logical Positivism common during the 1930s, but the more general view that logic is a positive and not a relativistic subject.

i. Realist Epistemology

Twentieth century Realism as first articulated by Moore, Russell, and others referred to either an epistemology of direct or indirect (representational) knowledge. For Anderson, such a distinction was false: Realism could only be an epistemology of the direct knowledge of the object. Anderson’s Realist epistemology was the view that in any relationship of knowledge, there are three distinct parts: a subject of knowledge or ‘knower’ (the –er); an object of knowledge or ‘known’ (the –ed); and the relation of knowing itself, the knowing (the –ing). On a Realist analysis, such a relationship had the logical form ‘S/r/O’; further, each part of the relationship – the S, r, O, or -er, -ing, -ed – was distinct from the other and could not be reduced to any other part. On this account, the relation of knowing between the subject and the object must be immediate and direct. Further, following the American New Realists, Anderson argued that the logic underlying such an epistemology was the doctrine of external relations, viz. in any relationship a/R/b, the terms of the relationship ‘a’ and ‘b’ exist independently of each other and of the relation ‘R’ between them. On Anderson’s view, to attempt to identify the relations a thing has with the things themselves is to commit the error of relativism. On this view, any attempt to identify or reduce the relation of knowing to the subject, or the object, is to render knowledge of either impossible as it fails to maintain the distinctness of the various parts of the relationship of knowledge. A further implication of this view for Anderson is that the qualities of either the subject or object cannot be constituted by the relations that it has. There is, then, an absolute distinction between qualities and relations. Again, to attempt to identify or reduce the qualities that a thing has with the relations that the qualities have is to commit the error of relativism. This criticism of relativism is the most common technique used in the exposition Anderson’s systematic Realist philosophy.

This conclusion – that an object, or its qualities, cannot be constituted by the relations that it has – had several interesting implications for Anderson’s philosophy of mind. Firstly, in terms of his epistemological theory, it implied that ‘consciousness’ – understood as both a quality of mind and a relation that mind has – cannot exist. There is, in brief, no such thing as ‘consciousness’. Further, since being conscious is a relation, then what is conscious must be some other quality of mind and since volition or will is also a relation, then it cannot be the required quality of mind. For Anderson, the only possible quality of mind that could be aware or conscious of the things around it, had to be emotion, feeling, or affect. It is emotions which know and it is emotions which act. This is Anderson’s theory of ‘mind as feeling’. This view appears to square with at least two important facts we know about the mind from Freudian psychoanalytic theory: firstly, that the mind, while unconscious, that is, asleep, can be active, for example, dreaming; secondly, that while the mind is conscious, there can be conflicting emotions operating at the same time and this can account for such mental features as slips of the tongue – one emotion is conscious in wanting to say something, but another emotion actually says what it needs to. While such a theory appears to be quite suggestive as a Realist theory of mind, it is unfortunate that Anderson never developed a detailed theory of which emotions constitute mind and how they operate.

ii. Empiricist Ontology

Anderson, following Alexander, described his ontological theory of existence as Empiricism, although, quite clearly, this is not the position of the British Empiricists, a theory he regarded as idealistic. His own understanding of Empiricism was a theory of situations or occurrences, where a situation is an occurrence in Space-Time and, as such, is characterized by various categories of existence. Anderson argued that there are three important associated doctrines associated with Empiricism: pluralism, determinism, and objectivism.

Anderson’s pluralism is the view that any thing is both a particular and a universal. That is, any thing is a universal that is composed of various things which together constitute it, and is a particular and therefore part of a thing greater than itself. In other words, there are no absolute or pure universals and no absolute or pure particulars. This is the foundation of Anderson’s theory of infinite complexity whereby there is no indivisible ‘atom’ from which all things are made, and no unrelatable totality – no ‘universe’ – which has nothing outside of it. Hence Anderson distinguished his position from the theories of monism and atomism understood as theories of logical totalities and logical simples.

Anderson’s determinism is the view that every thing or occurrence is caused. Since every thing is an occurrence in Space-Time, then every thing will have causal relations acting on it, and causal relations from it acting on other things. Hence Anderson opposed any theory of indeterminism and rejected the notion of a ‘free will’ as something outside the universe of spatiotemporal causality. Anderson’s objectivism is the view that any subject must also be an object. That is, he rejected the doctrine of subjectivism viz. that there things that are ‘irreducibly’ subjective. In terms of mind, the alleged ‘subjectivity’ of the mind is as objective as any other thing, that is, the mind as a subject, as a knower, is an existing thing with all the categorical features that other things possess.

iii. Positivist Logic

Anderson’s logical position is one he described as Positivism, although this is not to be confused with Logical Positivism, as Anderson believed that experimentation was an inadequate test for the truth or falsity of propositions. He believed, for example, that love is not something that can be studied experimentally. Anderson’s Positivism was simply a theory of the positive truth and falsity of propositions and therefore opposed to any theory which postulates that the context of a proposition or judgment determines its truth or falsity. Hence he rejected the Absolute Idealist view that it is the ‘Absolute’ which determines the truth of a judgment as well as the relativist position expressed by F.C.S. Schiller that it is the particular context of judging that determines the truth of a judgment. Judgements, or in Anderson’s terms, propositions, are true or false independently of any context at all. Their truth or falsity is determined simply in terms of things themselves. This theory of absolute truth or falsity implied the denial on any theory such as the Hegelian dialectic where logic ‘develops’ through the resolution of a logical contradiction into a ‘higher truth’.

Anderson accepted the traditional Aristotelian analysis of the proposition viz. that it is comprised of a subject, a predicate, a copula, and the quantifiers. The most general form of the proposition is ‘S is P’ where S is the subject function and P is the predicate function, while the copula ‘is’ incorporates both the positive and negative formulations, ‘is’ and ‘is not’. When the universal and particular quantifiers, ‘All’ and ‘Some’, are introduced, this yields the classical four forms of the proposition: All S are P (SaP), Some S are P (SiP), All S are not P (SeP), and Some S are not P (SoP).

However what distinguished Anderson’s treatment of the proposition from the traditional Aristotelian analysis was his insistence that the terms of the proposition must only refer to existing things and that the function of the copula was to indicate whether something was or was not the case, or, as he expressed it, was ‘an issue’. Hence he refused to admit fictional entities as terms in his logic and rejected non-existential uses of the copula such as the copula of identity and the copula of predication. So, any proposition must have a real or existing thing as a term in the subject function, a real or existing thing as a term in the predicate function, and the copula ‘is or is not’ either attributing the occurrence of the predicate to the subject, or not, as the case may be. In other words, a proposition expresses the occurrence of a predicate attributed to a subject in a particular situation located in Space-Time.

Another term used to describe Anderson’s Positivism was ‘Propositional Realism’. This expression is most typically used to describe the view that reality is propositional in nature. This is Anderson’s controversial identity theory of the proposition. Briefly stated, this is the view that any occurrence or situation is identical any proposition asserted about it. Anderson had rejected the view that the ‘proposition’ could be a tertium quid, (a representational view that a proposition is something which mediates our description about an actual occurrence), which committed him to the view that there must be, in some sense, an identity between propositions and situations. The difficulty with this view was that while it seems quite natural and correct to assert that true propositions are identical with existing situations, this clearly cannot be the case with false propositions. What situation, it can be asked, is identical with a false proposition? Are we meant to believe that a false proposition is identical with a non-existing situation? Anderson’s own solution to this problem was to assert that the mind ‘mis-takes’ a non-existing situation, for example, the sky being green today, with an actual existing situation viz. that the sky is blue. The plausibility of this reply focuses attention back on the initial criticism. If it is asserted that all situations are identical with proposition, then it is irrelevant to ask for the ontological status of false propositions. Ex hypothesi, they are identical with a situation. On the other hand, if we simply assert that it is only true propositions which are identical with existing situations, then there is no problem with the status of false propositions at all. As Anderson would say, the mind simply ‘mis-takes’ a non-existing situation for an existing one.

c. Realist Ethics

In his Realist ethical theory, Anderson drew a sharp distinction between ethics and morality. Morality is a system of imperatives and obligations which can only be understood relationally. If we assert that ‘X ought or should be done’, then there must always be a subject who is asserting that obligation. The function of moral science on this account is not to establish the absolute or categorical nature of the imperative, but to establish who is asserting such an imperative. In contrast, Anderson conceived of ethics as a science of goodness and badness. In this theory, good and bad are naturally occurring qualities of social and psychological activities. Hence he rejected the relativist view that relations somehow determine the quality of good. It is one of the more unusual features of Anderson’s ethical theory that there is no recommendation or discouragement implicit in the description of an activity as good or bad: we are simply describing an activity in an ordinary scientific sense.

As to the exact nature of the goods and bads themselves, Anderson argued that if we look at the history of ethical and moral philosophy then certain qualities which are consistently described as good, virtuous, or obligatory gives an indication as to the nature of the goods themselves. In his classification of goods and bads, Anderson was much influenced by Sorel’s theory of the producer ethic and the consumer ethic. The producer ethic is one which consumes in order to produce, while the consumer ethic is one which produces in order to consume. This implies that the producer ethic is essentially creative, inquiring, and productive (qualities that are exhibited in Sorel’s classification of social culture of Art, Science, and Industry), while the consumer ethic is imitative, obscurantist, and consumptive. Anderson later included love as the good, and hate as the bad, within the domestic sphere.

Anderson also utilized Socrates’ view that goods support one another but oppose bads, while bads oppose both goods and other bads to assist in his classification process. In other words, goods are essentially supportive, while bads are essentially oppositional. On this basis, Anderson argued that goods are co-operative and communicative, while bads are competitive and uncommunicative. That is, goods, in their relations of support, will seek to work with and communicate with other goods, while bads, in their relations of opposing, will fight against and not communicate with, both bads and goods. Anderson also listed other goods in his ethical theory including a care for exactitude and a rejection of the notion of a reward for doing something, but he never developed a full classification of the various goods and bads. This is one of the major criticisms of his ethical theory. It is one thing to assert that certain qualities are good and bad and that they operate in certain ways; it is quite another thing to actually show that this is a correct and true classification. Anderson never fulfilled this latter task.

i. Proletarianism

Anderson’s social and political theory during the 1930s has been described as a proletarian theory and by this term it is meant that it was of a general Marxist, and a specifically Communist, orientation. [Weblin 2003] Anderson’s Marxism was unique in that while he adhered to an overall materialist outlook such as the class structure of society and the distinction between economic base and social superstructure, he rejected Marx’s historical theory of dialectic. Hence while he agreed that during capitalism the proletariat and the bourgeoisie are engaged in class warfare, he did not think that the proletariat would succeed simply because it was part of a dialectical progression of history. Anderson’s analysis of this social conflict was also more pluralistic than Marx’s as he believed that the proletariat needed to work with artists and intellectuals to achieve social and political revolution. In this respect, the bourgeois origins of certain artists and intellectuals, such as Anderson himself, was irrelevant to the ongoing social conflict.

Apart from the broad proletarian orientation of Anderson’s social and political theory during the 1930s, there were two quite distinct moments in his active political engagement. From 1927 to 1932 Anderson was actively involved in the Communist Party of Australia. At this time, he believed Russian Communism was the pre-eminent model for Communist parties everywhere, although he supported the independent operation of local parties. Initially unaware on the pernicious influence of Stalin in Moscow, Anderson came to see that the Russian party was beset by bureaucracy, censorship, and ideology and his independent stance increasingly bought him into conflict with local members who were more prone to following the Moscow line. Anderson’s writings in defense of Communism during this period generally reflect his belief in determinism, pluralism, and objectivism in social and political activity.

In 1933, he helped form the Trotskyist Workers Party of Australia and remained actively involved for the next four years. His break with Communism in 1933 was occasioned more by his recognition of the corrupt nature of Stalinism, rather than any belief that Communism was inconsistent with his philosophic doctrines. Hence during this period, he retained the belief that Communist theory, untainted by Stalinist practice, was deterministic, pluralistic, and objective, and accepted that Trotskyism provided a viable theoretical and practical alternative to Stalinism. However by the time of his departure on sabbatical in December 1937, he had come to reject Trotskyism as a viable alternative to Stalinism and was questioning whether Marxism was in fact consistent with his Realist philosophy.

d. Realist Aesthetics

In his Realist aesthetic theory, Anderson often criticized aesthetic theories on the basis of either their relativism or their subjectivism. [Anderson 1982] Hence, in criticism of Subjectivism in aesthetics, he argued that if beauty is simply a question of what the subject believes or prefers, then there is nothing that is beautiful in itself. Such a claim is quite simply a denial of the very possibility of aesthetic theory. In contrast, in his criticism of relativist aesthetic theories such as Romanticism or Marxism, he argued that if beauty resides merely in the political context of the aesthetic judgment or the active willing of the aesthetic judgment, then again there can be no objective aesthetic theory. From these arguments, it could be reasonably assumed that Anderson believed that beauty, like goodness, was a quality of natural objects. However Anderson never explicitly stated this view, although he did once assert that beauty is a ‘character’ of natural objects.

Apart from these more formal features of Anderson’s aesthetic theory, there is some indication that he was also developing a more substantive theory of aesthetic damnation and redemption. Several times during the 1930s he quoted Joyce’s expression that ‘history is a nightmare from which I am trying to awake’, and that this subjection of man to history is the state of alienation of the self. Release from this servitude, Anderson suggested, is the affirmation of the human spirit through artistic creation and aesthetic criticism. However, he did not develop these views in detail.

3. Mature Philosophy 1939-1962

After Anderson’s return from sabbatical in 1938, there was a marked reduction in his academic output with only 25% of his entire academic corpus being written over the next twenty three years. While there was a marked change in his political views, the changes in his philosophical views are less detectable. In his writings on ethics, aesthetics, and history, it was not immediately apparent that he was departing from systematic Realism.

a. Ethics

During the war years, whilst Anderson’s ethical writings still stressed the qualitative nature of goodness, there was also an apparent change in emphasis on the concepts of liberty and servility as ethical relations within society. While he rejected an apparent inconsistency in his view that goodness is something which can be pursued, he still emphasized that goodness is a character or quality of specific social activities and cannot be identified with ‘that which is obliged or commanded’. He was also forced to clarify whether such qualities were psychological – for example, creativity and inquiry – or social – for example, co-operation and communication. His belief that goods, such as inquiry, might occur at the intersection of the psychological and social fields, led to speculation that goods might occupy a unique place of ‘psycho-social’ activity. [Eddy 1942] Anderson now stated that goods only occur in ‘causes’ or social movements which themselves strive after freedom. Accordingly, individuals who participate in social movements can be transformed by these movements to such an extent that they ‘transcend’ their self-imposed limitations and become free and creative in the process.

Apart from developing the formal features of his own theory, Anderson criticized both Christianity and Socialism for fostering an ethic of philanthropy. He argued that philanthropy seeks to provide relief to the underprivileged, but that such protection actually weakens the operation of those actual and independent social movements which can provide escape from the servitude of bourgeois society. He argued that such servility is not something that one can be ‘saved from’, as it is only by what men are and not by what they are given that they can win release from servitude. He also criticized Mill’s theory of ethical hedonism, arguing that while pleasure is a quality of natural things and hence could in principle define the nature of goodness, in fact it is too narrow a conception to provide such a definition.

This emphasis on liberty and servility became a more prominent feature of Anderson’s ethical writing and he argued that goods only exist in their struggle with evils. Accordingly, any attempt to abolish evil must also result in the abolition of good. In particular, he asserted that liberty only exists in its struggle with servility, and that the attempt to establish a State where insecurity and insufficiency are abolished is a servile goal and can never succeed.

i. Anti-Proletarianism

After his return from sabbatical, Anderson gradually developed a distinctive theory of liberal democracy. Consistent with his view that liberty only exists in relation to servility, he argued that liberty was not to be found enshrined in the rights, rules, and procedures of the State, but was exemplified in independent opposition to the State. Hence, at the time of the formulation of the Atlantic Charter with its statement of the ‘four freedoms’, he argued there are no rights that can guarantee freedom. A ‘right’, in this view, is only the expression of a certain social ‘might’.

Similarly, Anderson believed that democracy was not a ‘thing’ that is instituted in a polity, for example, representative democracy, but was the balance of diverse social interests, one of which was the State itself. Even though a polity may be nominally called a representative democracy, if the social and political organizations within that polity do not oppose incorporation into the State structure, it cannot truly be a democracy.

After the end of the war, Anderson’s writings on political theory were infrequent, although in the writing that does exist, two themes are dominant. Firstly, he opposed Communism at every opportunity. However, this opposition did not extend to supporting the banning of the Communist Party of Australia and in the 1950 referendum on this issue, he publicly and forcefully argued for the No case. Further, his opposition to the theoretical underpinnings of Communism led him to assert that egalitarianism was ‘the disease of the modern time’. Secondly, Anderson also defended the general features of a conservative theory of society. In particular, he defended the notion that social and cultural traditions have their own ‘rights’ and modes of operation with which the State must not interfere. This was especially the case with universities and academic traditions. It should be stressed that the distinction between Anderson’s democratic and conservative period is not clear cut, although in general terms he referred to his political thinking during this period as ‘anti-proletarian’. [Stavropolous 1992]

b. Aesthetics

After his return from sabbatical, the only writings of Anderson’s that deal expressly with aesthetic theory are his 1942 lectures on ethics and aesthetics. These lectures are a detailed discussion of the concept of beauty understood as either a theme in temporal arts such as music or drama, or as structure in spatial arts such as painting and sculpture. However, while Anderson was undecided on whether theme or structure was the best general description of beauty, he made the remarkable assertion that beauty cannot be a quality. Anderson’s equivocation over describing beauty as a quality during the 1930s has already been noted, but the implications of expressly denying that beauty is a quality cannot be underestimated. He must either assert that beauty is a relation and therefore deny the very possibility of any objective aesthetic theory or he must admit the inconsistency in his position and argue that aesthetics does not form part of his systematic Realist philosophy. In his more substantive aesthetic theory, he argued that man’s estrangement from society is caused by the loss of love between self and others, and that this estrangement can only be overcome by the activity of love. He further argued that the ‘eternal affirmation of the spirit of man in literature’ can be achieved in science as well as art, the difference being in terms of their style of presentation.

c. Ontology

Even though Anderson published very little after 1943, in his lectures he presented details of his ontology which were unknown previously. In his 1944 and 1949 lectures on Alexander’s Space, Time and Deity, Anderson presented his criticism of Alexander’s philosophy of emergent evolutionism. [Anderson 2005, 2007i. The 2005 lectures are in Anderson’s own hand and therefore are more accurate] For Alexander, Space and Time are the point and moment from which the universe begins and from which all things and qualities emerge, culminating, ultimately, in the emergence of Deity. [See entry in IEP on Samuel Alexander] In some places of Space, Time and Deity, Alexander held that Space and Time are created (and hence Super-Substantialist), although in other places he simply refers to Space and Time as the logical conditions of existence. It is this latter understanding of Space and Time that Anderson developed in his own lectures on Alexander.

i. Space-Time

Like Alexander, Anderson rejected both Idealist and physicalist accounts of the nature of Space and Time. He rejected the Idealist claim that Space-Time is simply an aspect of the Absolute and also rejected the physicalist or substantialist theory whereby Space-Time is itself a thing which comes into existence. Anderson argued that if we examine our own experience of Space and Time, we discover that our experience of Space is characterized by one, two, and three dimensionality such that we experience the spatiality of all things in terms of their length, breadth, and height. He similarly argued that our experience of Time is characterized by successiveness, transitiveness, and irreversibility. That is, our experience of Time is characterized by the experience of successive times, that one time follows another, that such times are transitive, that if B follows A, and C follows B, then C must follow A, and that time is irreversible, that we never experience time ‘going backwards’. He argued further that while we can abstractly separate Space and Time to consider their individual characteristics, we must always experience them as unified in Space-Time: there can be no experience of Space which is not also an experience of Time and there can be no experience of Time which is not also an experience of Space. Further, there are no limits to Space-Time insofar as both Space and Time are infinite. Space, in its extension, and Time, in its duration, has no finite beginning or end. So for Anderson, to say ‘a thing exists’ is to say it is an occurrence in Space-Time. He also called an occurrence in Space-Time, a ‘situation’.

ii. The Categories of Existence

For Anderson, a thing, in existing in Space-Time, has certain categorical features. He followed Alexander’s treatment of the categories, albeit in a slightly modified form, and argued there were a total of thirteen categories: Identity, Diversity, Existence, Relation, Universality, Particularity, Number, Order, Quantity, Intensity, Substance, Causality, and Individuality. However, we immediately strike a difficulty in Anderson’s treatment of these categories because, while in the text of his lectures he treats the above thirteen categories separately, when he came to classify them he treated two of them – Universality and Quantity – as having dual senses, and therefore expanded the number of categories to fifteen. Hence in one grouping of the categories he distinguishes between logical or propositional categories, mathematical or quantitative categories, and physical or qualitative categories in the following manner:

Logical: Identity; Diversity; Existence; Relation; Universality (Logical)

Mathematical: Universality (Mathematical); Particularity; Number; Order; Quantity (Mathematical)

Physical: Quantity (Physical); Intensity; Substance; Causality; Individuality (Physical Identity)

Quite clearly, this grouping can only be achieved by treating the categories on Universality and Quantity in the dual manner outlined above. Further, as if this classification was not confusing enough already, he also argued that the final category, Individuality, could be regarded as Physical Identity and thus contrasted with the first category, Identity, which he now described as Abstract Identity. This would imply that Individuality is simply one aspect of Identity and thus would reduce the original thirteen categories down to twelve. The exact number of categories is determined only by the method by which you approach them: thirteen as they appear in the text; fifteen if you treat them as three groups of five; or twelve if you treat Individuality as simply an aspect of Identity.

Regarding the specifics of the categories, Anderson argued Alexander failed to present a principle by which the categories could be ordered and he argued that such a principle could be found in the ‘proposition’. He argued that in the logical or propositional categories, the first category, Identity, is treated as mere abstract identity and is indicated by the subject term of the proposition. In contrast, Diversity is everything that is not Identity and is indicated by the rest of the proposition. The contrast and distinction between Identity and Diversity gives us the category of Existence which is indicated by the copula in the proposition. However to assert one specific existence implies that we must have another distinct existence and hence we develop the category of Relation, of various existences related in Space and Time to each other, and these are indicated by the predicate of the proposition. Finally, in having various existences commonly related, we have the category of Universality in its logical sense as a theory of types.

In the transition to the quantitative or mathematical categories, Universality is now treated in its quantitative sense as the universal quantifier to the proposition, ‘All’. In contrast to the universal quantifier, we have the particular quantifier of the proposition, ‘Some’, and this gives us the category of Particularity. While Anderson often asserted that the universal and particular quantifiers were all that was needed to provide the four logical forms of the proposition, his next category, Number, indicates that Universality and Particularity are simply numerical in that they refer to objects that can be counted within a specific field or situation. Further, the next category, Order, indicates that not only can objects be counted, but that they can also be ordered within a given series as they occur in a given field or situation. The final mathematical category is Quantity and this refers to the fact that any number that occurs along a spatial or temporal continuum is real and hence either rational or irrational.

In the transition to the physical categories, Quantity is now treated in its physical sense as the filling of the spaces and times that mathematical Quantity indicated as only an abstraction. In this sense, physical quantity can be described as ‘matter’, although the better general description is ‘solidity’. On this account, solidity is the ‘space-filling’ that occurs when something is located in Space-Time. The next category, Intensity, is probably the most difficult of all of Anderson’s categories to understand. On the one hand, Intensity refers to the qualities that a thing possesses and if this was all that was meant it would be an unproblematic category. However, Anderson also intended Intensity to refer to any comparative of an object (such as its size) and it is clear that the one category cannot refer to both comparative differences between objects and their actual qualities. The next category is Substance and this refers to the structure of a thing or the internal balance or harmony of the tensions that occur within a thing. As a concrete example of Substance, Anderson argues that the substance or structure of water is H₂0. While this idea is clear enough, the relation of Substance to Intensity remains unclear. The category of Substance leads on to the category of Causation which is not a mere succession of situations, but involves the replacing of one situation with another. The final category is that of Individuality, which is the combination of the quality and quantity of a thing to give us the concrete identity of a thing. As concrete Identity, Individuality can be contrasted with the abstract Identity with which we began.

Some of the key criticisms of Anderson’s theory of the categories have already been noted, although there is one further criticism that goes to the heart of his metaphysical system. For Anderson, any meaningful proposition must have terms that are referential – that is, they refer to actual objects, qualities, and situations. However Anderson insisted on several occasions that the categories cannot be understood as mere things, as they are, by definition, those universal or categorical features which all things possess. The difficulty for Anderson is that since his criteria for intelligible and meaningful discourse is limited to ‘propositions’ which have terms that refer to things, since the categories can never be such terms, then we can never have meaningful or intelligible discourse of the categories. This criticism is often described as ‘the unspeakability of the categories’.

d. Realism versus Idealism

While Anderson’s lectures on Alexander were an important contribution to the development and presentation of an ontology he described as Empiricism, it is important to note that at the very time that these lectures were being given, he appeared to be revising his assessment of the relationship between Realism and Idealism. During the 1930s, Anderson treated Realism and Idealism as logical opposites: one could not be asserted without denying the other and the assertion of Idealism led to certain irresolvable difficulties. It is surprising then that in 1949 in personal correspondence with his colleague Ruth Walker, he stated that his major intellectual problem since childhood appears to have been his ‘idealism’; his inability to accept multiplicity as a feature of the world rather than as something to be overcome or transcended. [Weblin 2005i] Even more significantly, he went on to say that only Walker would appreciate his idealism and see it as a ‘stimulating influence’ and ‘not as mere waste’. Unfortunately, Anderson didn’t go on to elaborate exactly how this ‘idealism’ manifested itself in his philosophy and so we have to simply accept his view that he regarded his philosophy, or at least significant parts of it, as ‘Idealist’. It is also noteworthy that in 1950 he wrote to Walker that he appears to be going ‘more and more Hegelian’ and in 1952 he spoke of his ‘revived Hegelianism’. Again, in neither case did he elaborate on the meaning of these statements and so we must accept his prima facie claim that he now thought of his philosophy in Hegelian terms.

Anderson did not reconsider his views on his systematic Realism until an address on the occasion of his retirement from Sydney University in 1958. [Anderson 1958] Much of this article was a standard defense of his conception of Realism. He argued that Realism denies the privileged position that Idealism had reserved for mind as qualifying all of reality and that there was no special difficulty in showing that there was nothing mental about the logic of relations. He emphasized that the most important advance made by Realism was the movement from the vague notion of ‘the real’ to the spatio-temporality of things as part of a general objective theory of reality. However, in an apparent qualification of his earlier views, he also argued that a common error made by Realists is to mistake the object of Realist attack as Idealism, whereas the real object of criticism is Rationalism and its dualist doctrine of ‘essences’. He also praised Hegel’s doctrine of Objective Mind as an important step towards a general objectivist position. So despite his criticism of the Idealist claim the relations are mental, he thought that Idealists such as Hegel had made important contributions towards Realism and qualified his earlier claim that Idealism is the true object of Realist criticism. When these admissions are coupled with his earlier self-description as an ‘Idealist’ promoting a ‘revived Hegelianism’, it is questionable that he believed Realism was the best overall description for his systematic conception of philosophy.

e. History

During the 1950s Anderson’s main academic interest was the question of history. While he had shown a general interest in questions of history since the 1930s, and during the 1940s had dealt especially with Croce’s writings on history. From 1950 onwards he wrote several academic articles dealing specifically with the subject of history. [Anderson 1954, 1959, 1960] The most noteworthy feature of these writings was their consistency with Anderson’s empiricist ontology. Firstly, Anderson insisted that history operates according to deterministic causal laws. There is no place for ‘free will’ within his theory of history. Secondly, Anderson’s theory of history was objectivist and materialist. That is, there is no place for any peculiar subjective or non-material entities. In this respect, even though Anderson was at this time rejecting Communism and egalitarianism as mere political ideologies, he was defending Marx’s historical materialism as an accurate theoretical account of historical forces. However he did not, as previously noted, adhere to a dialectical materialism. Dialectic, as a historical force, is inconsistent with strict determinism. Further, Anderson’s theory of history was a pluralist theory in that it recognized the complex interplay between psychological and social forces in history. One final feature of Anderson’s theory of history which coalesces with his Empiricist ontology is his emphasis on liberty as a dominant force in the working of historical processes. While this at first appears inconsistent with his denial of free will, Anderson understood liberty to be an objective and determined social force. It is only through the causally determined operation of social movements that liberty can be expressed.

f. Empiricism

In the last decade of his life, Anderson wrote little on his systematic conception of philosophy. However the last article he wrote was titled ‘Empiricism and Logic’ and this use of the term ‘Empiricism’, and the fact that his collection of articles was titled Studies in Empirical Philosophy, gives us a clear indication that Anderson believed that Empiricism was the best name for his overall conception of philosophy. In this article he argued that Empiricism is the doctrine of the continuity of all things; that is, that any thing, in existing, is continuous with all other things by existing in Space-Time and sharing common categories such as Substance, Causality, and Identity. Since these categories are universal features of any existing thing, they cannot themselves be things and can only be understood as formal features of things. Further, these common categorical forms can only be known and expressed in terms of propositional functions such as subject, predicate, and copula and the propositional form ‘S is P’. It is significant that Anderson also argued that the common measure of terrestrial events cannot itself be a thing, for such a common measure could only be something formal, that is, non-terrestrial. The ‘idealism’ in Anderson’s Empirical philosophy is clearly evident in this view that the logical or formal nature of categories and propositions could not be understood in terms of things subject to ordinary empirical experience.

4. Conclusion

For a philosopher who had a significant, albeit indirect, influence on twentieth century Anglo-Saxon philosophy, there is a very little contemporary research into Anderson’s philosophy and a remarkably poor understanding of what that philosophy actually is. The explanation of this lies partly in the character of the man himself. His philosophic style was confined to writing condensed articles for a journal that, at that time, was remote from the main centers of philosophical activity. He never published a philosophic book during his lifetime and therefore never exposed himself to criticism beyond the confines of the Australian philosophical community. He also appears to have been reluctant to publish articles on philosophy during the last fifteen years of his life. Only a small percentage of his total published output was written during that period. However, the most serious criticism that can be directed at him is that he never bothered to develop the positions that he advanced. Whether it was his mature political position, his philosophy of mind, his ethical theory, or his aesthetic theory, Anderson sketched out a position but never provided the details or framework of how that position might be developed further. Be that as it may, the scope and logical rigor of Anderson’s philosophy provides a uniquely systematic alternative to the strictures of twentieth century analytic philosophy.

Nonetheless, the exact nature and name of this systematic philosophy is matter of some debate. The most commonly known title of Realism was most widely used during the 1930s, but after that time Anderson made statements and advanced positions that clearly qualified his acceptance of the suitability of that term as a relevant description of his philosophy. In contrast, after the end of the 1930s Anderson used and discussed the term Empiricism far more widely. Indeed his lectures on Alexander during the 1940s are detailed examinations of the substance of Empiricism itself. It may be thought that such a change is merely a change of a name, although the change from the Realist doctrine of external relations and the consequent distinction between qualities and relations to a theory of spatiotemporality, propositionality, and the categories of existence is clearly more than simply a nominal one.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Anderson, John (1954) ‘Politics and Morals,’ Australasian Journal of Philosophy 32: 213-22.
Anderson, John (1958) ‘Realism’ The Australian Highway (Journal of the Workers Educational Association, Australia): Sept. pp 53 -56.
Anderson, John (1959)‘The Illusion of the Epoch’ Australasian Journal of Philosophy 37: 156-67.
Anderson, John (1960) ‘Time and Idea’ Australasian Journal of Philosophy 38: 163-72.
Anderson, John (1962) Studies in Empirical Philosophy. Angus and Robertson: Sydney.
- [Collection of Anderson’s metaphysical and ethical articles published posthumously. Includes 15pp Introduction by J.A. Passmore.]
Anderson, John (1980) Education and Inquiry. Edited by Phillips, D. Z. Basil Blackwell: Oxford.
- [Collection of Anderson’s educational articles]
Anderson, John (1982) Art and Reality. Edited by Cullum, Graham and Lycos, Kimon. Hale and Ironmonger: Sydney.
- [Collection of Anderson’s aesthetic and literary criticism articles. Includes 17pp Introduction by G. Cullum and K. Lycos.]
Anderson, John (2003) A Perilous and Fighting Life. Edited by Weblin, Mark. Pluto Press: Sydney
- [Collection of Anderson’s political articles. Includes 12pp Introduction and 10pp Postscript by M. Weblin.]
Anderson, John (2005) Space-Time and the Proposition. Edited by Weblin, Mark. Sydney University Press: Sydney
- [Anderson’s 1944 lectures on Alexander’s Space, Time and Deity. Original notes in own hand. Includes 18pp Introduction by M. Weblin.]
Anderson, John (2007i) Space, Time and the Categories. Edited by Cole, Creagh. Sydney University Press: Sydney
- [Anderson’s 1944 lectures on Alexander’s Space, Time and Deity. Student notes only. Includes 5pp Introduction by D.M. Armstrong.]
Anderson, John (2007ii) Lectures in Political Theory. Edited by Cole, Creagh. Sydney University Press: Sydney
- [Anderson’s 1941 lectures on T.H. Green’s Principles of Political Obligation, 1942 lectures on Political Theory (discussing Bosanquet and Lenin), and 1945 lectures on Socialism. Original notes in own hand. Includes 18pp Introduction by C. Cole.]
Anderson, John (2008i) Lectures in Greek Philosophy. Edited by Cole, Creagh. Sydney University Press: Sydney
- [Anderson’s 1928 lectures on Greek Philosophy. Original notes in own hand. Includes 11pp Introduction by G. Cullum]
Anderson, John (2008ii) Lectures in Modern Philosophy: Hume, Reid, James. Edited by Cole, Creagh. Sydney University Press: Sydney
- [Anderson’s 1932 lectures on Hume and 1935 lectures on Reid and James. Original notes in own hand. Includes 18pp Introduction by C. Cole.]
The John Anderson Archive, the online archive of Anderson’s lectures and articles at the University of Sydney Library (compiled 2006–2010).

b. Secondary Sources

Armstrong, David M., (1977) “On Metaphysics”, Quadrant, 21 (7): 64–69.
- [Outline of Anderson’s metaphysical position.]
Armstrong, David M., (2001) “Interview” Matters of the Mind: Poems, Essays and Interviews in Honour of Leonie Kramer, Edited by Lee Jobling and Catherine Runcie. Sydney: University of Sydney Press: pp. 322-332.
- [Discusses importance of Anderson on Armstrong’s intellectual development.]
Baker, A.J. (1979) Anderson’s Social Philosophy. Angus and Robertson: Sydney.
- [Outline of Anderson’s political theories and development.]
Baker, A.J. (1986) Australian Realism. Cambridge University Press: Cambridge.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s systematic Realism]
Birchall, B. (1983) “The Problem of Form” International Studies in Philosophy 15: 15-40.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s theory of form.]
Cole, Creagh McLean, (2009) “John Anderson’s Political Thought Revisited”, Australian Journal of Political Science, 44(2): 229–44.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s political theory.]
Cole, Creagh McLean, (2010) “The Ethic of the Producers: Sorel, Anderson and Macintyre”, History of Political Thought, 31(1): 155–76.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s ethical theory.]
Cole, Creagh McLean, (2012) ‘John Anderson’ Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- [Detailed discussion of Anderson’s philosophy.]
Eddy, Harry (1944) “Ethics and Politics” Australasian Journal of Psychology and Philosophy 22: 70-92.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s psycho-social conception of good.]
Hibberd, Fiona, (2009) “John Anderson’s Development of (Situational) Realism and its Bearing on Psychology Today”, History of the Human Sciences, 22(4): 63–92.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s philosophy in relation to contemporary psychology.]
Kennedy, Brian (1996) A Passion to Oppose. Melbourne University Press: Melbourne.
- [Biography of Anderson’s life focusing on personal, social and political themes.]
Mackie, John L., (1951) “Logic and Professor Anderson”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 29(2): 109–113.
- [Reply to Ryle (1950).]
Mackie, John L., (1985) “The Philosophy of John Anderson”, Logic and Knowledge: Selected Papers (Volume I), Oxford: Clarendon Press, pp. 1–20.
- [Detailed exposition of Anderson’s philosophy. Originally published in AJP following Anderson’s death.]
Passmore, John (1969) “Russell and Bradley”. Contemporary Philosophy in Australia. Edited by R. Brown and C. Rollins. London: George Allen & Unwin, 21-30.
- [Critical exposition of Anderson’s pluralism.]
Passmore, John (1997) Memoirs of a Semi-detached Australian. Melbourne: Melbourne University Press.
- [Extensive discussion of Anderson’s influence on Passmore’s philosophical development.]
Ryle, Gilbert, (1950) “Logic and Professor Anderson”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 28(3): 137–53.
- [Critical analysis of Anderson’s philosophy.]
Stavropoulos , Pam (1992) “Conservative Radical” The Australian Journal of Anthropology 3: 67-79.
- [Discussion of Anderson’s conservatism.]
Weblin, Mark. (1995) ‘The Place of John Anderson in the History of Philosophy’ unpublished PhD thesis. University of New England, Armidale, N.S.W., Australia
- [Critical and systematic exposition of Anderson’s philosophical development.]
Weblin, Mark (2005) ‘John Anderson’ Dictionary of Twentieth Century British Philosophers. Edited by Stuart Brown. Bloomsbury Academic: London.
- [Discussion of Anderson’s place in twentieth century British philosophy.]
Weblin, Mark (2007) ‘John Anderson on Reid and Scottish Philosophy’ The Monist 90: 310-25.
- [Critical discussion of Anderson’s criticisms of Thomas Reid.]
Weblin, Mark (2010) ‘John Anderson and Idealism’ Biographical Encyclopedia of British Idealism. Edited by Sweet, William. Bloomsbury Academic: London.
- [Discussion of Anderson’s ‘Idealism’.]
Weblin, Mark (2014) “John Anderson Arrives: 1930s” History of Philosophy in Australia and New Zealand. Edited by Oppy, Graham & Trakakis, Nick. Springer: Netherlands pp 55-87.
- [Detailed discussion of Anderson’s philosophical, social, and political development.]

Author Information

Mark Weblin
Email: markweblin@gmail.com
Australia

Constructivism in Metaethics

It is difficult to provide an uncontroversial statement of constructivism in metaethics, since the terms of this doctrine are themselves the focus of philosophical debate. However, this view is now perhaps most commonly understood as a metaphysical thesis concerning how we are to understand the nature of normative facts–that is, facts about what we ought to do. Most broadly, it is the view that the correctness of our judgments about what we ought to do is determined by facts about what we believe, or desire, or choose and not, as realism would have it, by facts about a prior and independent normative reality.

Defenders of constructivism have claimed that it represents a new, free-standing alternative to familiar approaches in metaethics. If they are correct, traditional discussions in metaethics have overlooked an important position, one that is supposed to adequately explain the nature of our ethical thinking and practice while avoiding the kinds of objections that traditional views struggle with. However, in order for this to be the case, constructivism must be characterized more narrowly—as the broad characterization above would appear to be true of a number of well-established positions in metaethics (including response-dependence theories and other forms of subjectivism). What form this narrower characterization should take and whether constructivists can make good on this more ambitious claim remains controversial.

This article starts out in section 1 with a brief account of the origins of contemporary discussions of constructivism. Sections 2 and 3 canvass the main motivations and arguments for constructivism along with the various ways in which the view has been interpreted. Section 4 introduces a serious challenge to the ambitious claim that constructivism represents a new, free-standing approach in metaethics. Section 5 entertains a proposal developed in the 21^st century that this challenge might overlook.

Origins of the View
The Scope and Ambition of Metaethical Constructivism
Motivation and General Argumentative Strategy
Is Constructivism “Free-Standing”?
A Challenge to Traditional Metaethics
References and Further Reading

1. Origins of the View

Contemporary discussion of constructivism in ethics largely originates in the work of John Rawls. Along the way to developing a normative foundation for just political institutions that could be divorced from deep and irreconcilable metaphysical disagreements, Rawls entertained a view that he called Kantian constructivism.

Kantian constructivism holds that moral objectivity is to be understood in terms of a suitably constructed social point of view that all can accept. Apart from the procedure of constructing the principles of justice, there are no moral facts. Whether certain facts are to be recognized as reasons of right and justice, or how much they are to count, can be ascertained only from within the constructivist procedure, that is, from the undertakings of rational agents of construction when suitably represented as free and equal moral persons. (1980: 519)

The parties in the original position do not agree on what the moral facts are, as if there already were such facts. It is not that, being situated impartially, they have a clear and undistorted view of a prior and independent moral order. Rather (for constructivism), there is no such order, and therefore no such facts apart from the procedure of construction as a whole; the facts are identified by the principles that result. (1980: 568)

According to the view Rawls presents here, it is not the case that the moral facts merely coincide with such agreements or that the choice procedure may be used to discover what the relevant standards are. Rather, according to constructivism, moral truths (for example, truths about “right and justice”) are determined by procedures in the sense that the moral standards that fix the relevant class of moral facts are constituted by their emergence from special procedures. It is these facts that make our moral assertions true or false. This is what Rawls means when he says that there are no moral facts apart from the procedure.

Rawls discusses Kantian constructivism across a number of different works. However, his most thorough treatment of the view can be found in the above-quoted Dewey Lectures, collectively titled “Kantian Constructivism in Moral Theory”. Here, like in many of his other works, Rawls is primarily concerned with describing and defending an interpretation of justice as fairness–“the idea that the principles of justice are agreed to in an initial situation that is fair” (1971/1999: 11). Rawls famously argues that facts about justice are fixed by principles that would be agreed to in the original position, a procedure in which free and equal citizens agree to terms of social cooperation under the condition that they do not know facts about who they are or what they deeply care about (what Rawls refers to as “the veil of ignorance”).

Some scholars, including Rawls, see a historical precedent for metaethical constructivism in the work of Immanuel Kant. This is why Rawls and some other metaethical constructivists have described their views as Kantian. However, as a point of historical interpretation this is controversial. More recently, philosophers have developed versions of constructivism that are supposed to find their inspiration in the work of other historical figures. For example, along with the Kantian varieties, one can now find Aristotelian (Lebar 2008), Humean (Street 2008, 2010; Lenman 2010), and Nietzschean (Silk 2014) versions of constructivism represented in the philosophical literature.

Although Rawls is generally credited with introducing constructivism into contemporary metaethical debates, the details of his own presentation have tended to obscure the underlying view. In particular, his focus on the facts of justice, as opposed to moral or normative facts more generally, has led many to interpret him as merely presenting a restricted form of constructivism, one that is compatible with a number of metaethical interpretations (including realism). Moreover, Rawls is clear in later works that political constructivism (the name for his mature interpretation of justice as fairness) is intended as a practical doctrine, not a metaphysical one; it should be interpreted as neutral with respect to deeper philosophical commitments that could potentially be the source of reasonable political disagreements. This has led those interested in the view to look elsewhere for a full-fledged metaethical account of constructivism.

2. The Scope and Ambition of Metaethical Constructivism

As the preceding discussion of Rawls already suggests, there are different ways of interpreting constructivism depending on how one characterizes the scope of the view. And how one characterizes the scope depends in turn on how metaethically ambitious one intends one’s constructivism to be. The following subsection will present Plato’s famous Euthyphro Question as a way of introducing what is perhaps the broadest way of capturing constructivism. Although this broad characterization captures something that is recognizably metaethical, it also ends up capturing too much and, consequently, fails to describe constructivism in a way that would make it a novel and interesting alternative to familiar metaethical positions. The three remaining subsections present narrower conceptions of the view and discuss some of the challenges that defenders of these forms of constructivism face.

As we will see, these narrower versions of constructivism can be distinguished along one of three separate axes. The first axis concerns whether constructivism counts as a first-order account of some particular domain of ethical thinking or a second-order (that is, metaethical) account of the nature of ethical thinking as such. The second axis concerns whether we should expect constructivism to yield convergence on a single class of correct ethical judgments. The third axis concerns whether a constructivist account of the nature of ethical thinking as such counts as a novel, free-standing metaethical interpretation or, rather, as a version of one or another familiar alternatives. Each of these axes will be explored in turn.

a. The Euthyphro Question

Ethical practice includes certain characteristic activities: we value things; we take actions to be wrong, or right, or permissible; we also take some things to count as reasons for acting. One question that metaethics considers is the relation between these activities and the kinds of properties and facts we most generally refer to when using evaluative, moral, and normative language (if indeed we use it to express a state of mind that refers to anything at all).

Although contemporary philosophy has generated a flurry of literature on this topic, the underlying question is a very old one. It is arguably a version of the one that Plato entertains in his presentation of a dialogue between Socrates and his eponymous interlocutor, Euthyphro. There the topic is piety. Specifically, is something pious because the gods love it? Or do the gods love it because it is pious? Plato’s brief arguments in the dialogue have been interpreted in different ways and done little to quiet interest in these questions. In order to broaden the terms of the discussion, we may recast Euthyphro’s question “in rough secular paraphrase” (Street 2010: 370).

Do we value things because they are valuable? Or do things have value because we value them?
Do we take certain actions to be wrong (or right or permissible) because they are wrong (or right or permissible)? Or are these actions wrong (or right or permissible) because we take them to be so?
Do we take certain features of the world to count as reasons for action because they are reasons? Or do these features count as reasons for action because we take them to be so?

These are metaphysical questions. How we answer them will say something about the kinds of facts or properties that exist and what they are like–for example, whether an account of these facts and properties must make essential reference to these activities or the standpoints that characterize them. Constructivists–about (i) value, or (ii) morality, or (iii) reasons–answer “no” to the first of each of these pairs of questions and “yes” to the second. Realists–about (i) value, or (ii) morality, or (iii) reasons–answer “yes” to the first of each of these pairs of question and “no” to the second. In order to simplify things, this article will use “ethical” to refer to the broadest category of practical thinking, one encompassing all three of the categories above. In other words, then, the distinction the Euthyphro question prompts us to consider is one between constructivism and realism in metaethics.

Things are actually more complicated here. Neither constructivism nor realism may be alone in taking these particular positions, depending on how one defines each view. On the one hand, one might object that the distinction is not merely between constructivists and realists but between constructivists and realists or quasi-realists. Defenders of quasi-realism, such as Simon Blackburn, explicitly claim that they side with realists on this issue but, nevertheless, reject the realist’s view about what it is to make an ethical judgment–that is, they reject the realist’s account of the semantics of ethical terms and expressions and its accompanying metaphysical commitments. On the other hand, one may object that a defender of a response-dependence theory or subjectivism, more generally, would respond to these questions in the same way that the constructivist does. Although the Euthyphro question is a helpful point of entry for understanding what is generally at issue in debates between constructivists and realists, the distinction it introduces captures broader families of views under which constructivism and realism fall. Hence, if we are to understand what is special and interesting about constructivism and the challenge it poses to realism, we must introduce a further set of distinctions.

b. Local versus Global

One such further distinction concerns whether we ought to understand constructivism as restricted to a local domain of ethical discourse or whether we ought to take constructivism to provide a global account of the nature of ethics (Enoch 2009). For reasons that will become clear in the course of the discussion, this distinction is also sometimes described in terms of “restricted” versus “thoroughgoing” accounts of constructivism (see Street 2008 for coinage of these terms). According to the former understanding, one could opt to provide a constructivist account of a species of ethical facts–for example, facts about justice–but remain silent as to whether other species of ethical facts–for example, facts about morality or reasons for action–are constructed. According to the latter understanding, constructivism provides the correct account of all ethical facts (including facts about justice, morality, value, and reasons). This distinction matters for two reasons.

First, many early and influential presentations of constructivism in ethics appear to be restricted to local domains of ethical discourse. For example, let us consider Rawls’s justice as fairness and T.M. Scanlon’s (1998) constructivist view of morality, or what we owe to each other. According to the former, the facts of justice are determined by principles agreed to by free and equal citizens who are faced with the task of establishing fair terms of social co-operation. According the latter, the facts about which acts are morally wrong are determined by whether these acts “…would be disallowed by any set of principles for the general regulation of behaviour that no one could reasonably reject as a basis for informed, unforced, general agreement” (Scanlon 1998: 153). These two views count as forms of constructivism insofar as each characterizes a particular class of ethical facts (facts about justice, facts about morality) as a function of our volitional attitudes–that is, facts about what we would will, or choose, or agree to, or reject.

As we have already seen, Rawls would appear to restrict his constructivist treatment to facts about justice. In fact, his mature statement of political constructivism would appear to require this. Rawls argues that a constructivist account of all of morality (or value or reasons for action) would be subject to reasonable disagreement and could not serve as a stable basis for an enduring consensus about what justice requires. Similarly, Scanlon restricts his constructivist account of morality to facts about what is right, wrong, and permissible; it does not extend to all facts about what our reasons for action are.

Second, such local forms of constructivism would appear to be compatible with different metaethical interpretations (including realism) and, hence, would not count as competitors to standard alternatives in metaethics. In order to illustrate this point, let us assume (as many philosophers now do) that the concept of a reason is the basic normative concept which unifies different areas of ethical thinking and practice–that is, different areas of ethical discourse are ultimately concerned with particular classes of practical reasons. Working under such an assumption, one might say that Rawls’s political constructivism grounds reasons of justice in a further set of reasons: namely, those had by free and equal citizens who are faced with the task of establishing fair terms of social co-operation. Similarly, one might say that Scanlon’s moral constructivism grounds moral reasons in further reasons: namely, a reason to live together with others on terms that they could not reasonably reject together with reasons for rejecting proposed sets of moral principles. But importantly, neither Rawls nor Scanlon provides an account of the nature of these grounding reasons. Rawls’s political constructivism does not attempt to explain what it is for free and equal citizens in this situation to have such reasons; Scanlon’s moral constructivism does not explain what it is to have a reason to live together with others on terms that they could not reasonably reject or what it is to have reason to reject a proposed set of moral principles. In principle, one might explain these grounding reasons in non-constructivist terms–for example, in terms of expressivism or even realism. Indeed, Scanlon himself appears to favor a kind of non-naturalist realist interpretation of these more basic reasons. Yet another option would be to explain these grounding reasons themselves in constructivist terms.

A global form of constructivism is one that attempts to explain the nature of reasons as such in constructivist terms. Again, we will follow defenders of this view and assume here that the concept of a reason is the basic normative concept. It follows then, on this view, that all normative facts are constructed. In order for this to be the case, however, constructivism cannot privilege any one class of substantive reasons as the grounds for all the others. For again this would leave open the possibility of explaining these grounding reasons in terms of some other metaethical interpretation. Rather, a global constructivism must be thoroughgoing and apply to all practical reasons; it must avoid making any substantive commitments about the content of our practical reasons.

In other words, constructivism must be characterized formally (Street 2010: 369). This means that what it is to have a reason is not characterized in terms of other kinds of reasons but, rather, in terms of certain formal conditions (for example, consistency and coherence) that one’s attitudes must satisfy. On this view, one has a reason to perform some act just in case the idealized set of attitudes one would have, were these formal conditions to be satisfied, would (in some sense) support performing this act. By characterizing what it is to have a reason in such terms, global (or thoroughgoing) constructivism would at least appear to be incompatible with the kind of objectivity involved in a robust understanding of ethical realism (see section 3a for discussion). However, whether this characterization suffices to distinguish global constructivism from other familiar non-realist alternatives in metaethics is less clear. Before discussing this, one should note two further distinctions that have been made within the class of global constructivist views.

c. Humean versus Kantian

Sharon Street (2010) has observed that global, formally-characterized versions of constructivism may be further divided into those views that guarantee convergence on a single class of substantive reasons for action and those that do not guarantee such convergence. In other words, global constructivists may disagree about whether the formal constraints on one’s attitudes are sufficient for generating a single set of normative truths or whether these constraints may yield different, conflicting sets of normative truths depending on the attitudes one starts out with. The former she calls Kantian constructivism (note that, unlike Rawls, Street restricts the use of this term to forms of global constructivism); the latter Humean constructivism.

According to Humean constructivists–which importantly includes Street (2008, 2010)–formal construction conditions constrain what one’s reasons are but they do not fully determine the content of the reasons that one has; rather, the content of one’s reasons depends to a significant extent on the content of the attitudes that one starts out with. So, for example, two people with radically divergent attitudes (beliefs, desires) to start with are likely going to have divergent sets of reasons for action. In other words, Humean constructivists are open to the possibility of a kind of relativism about practical reasons. This means that, on their view, it might turn out that when the constructivist’s formal conditions are applied to most people’s attitudes, they yield a set of practical reasons that support common-sense views about morality, like the view that we have reason not to torture others for fun. However, on their view, it might also turn out that an ideally-coherent Caligula–that is, someone who values torturing others for fun above all else and whose attitudes satisfy all of the formal constructivist conditions–has absolutely no reason not to torture other people for fun (Street 2009, 2010). Of course, such a view fails to conform extensionally to many people’s considered judgments about the substance of practical reasons. This is considered by some to be a serious theoretical cost to accepting this form of constructivism.

According to Kantian constructivists like Christine Korsgaard (1996), the formal conditions of construction will always generate a single class of normative outcomes, regardless of the attitudes one starts out with–that is, even if one starts out with the non-idealized attitudes of a Caligula (generally considered a sadistic and insane tyrant). In other words, Kantian constructivists think that they can preserve a strong, anti-relativist sense of objectivity for practical reasons without the controversial metaphysical commitments of realism. Moreover, Kantian constructivists argue that the single class of practical reasons generated by constructivism is also the very same class of reasons traditionally supported by “common sense”–that is, one including moral reasons to keep one’s promises, to aid, and to forebear from harming others. However, some philosophers argue that the constructivist cannot guarantee such convergence without smuggling in realist metaphysical commitments; others argue that such a view confuses the theoretical aims of metaethics with those of a first-order theory of practical reason.

d. Familiar versus Novel

Regardless of where one stands on the issue of convergence, there is the further question of whether “global constructivism” is supposed to capture a familiar class of metaethical views or whether it is supposed to refer to a novel and as-of-yet unexplored alternative to these. Some philosophers employ the term “constructivism” to capture a broad family of views, one characterized by their shared response to the Euthyphro question. While this understanding of constructivism might draw our attention to commonalities among these views that normally go unnoticed, this understanding does not offer a novel position. This arguably limits our interest in constructivism. Other philosophers employ the term “constructivism” more narrowly to capture a much more ambitious view, namely, one that counts as a free-standing alternative to existing metaethical alternatives. If they are correct, then traditional discussions in metaethics have overlooked an important position (compare Sayre McCord 1988, Railton 1996), one that is supposed to adequately explain the nature of our ethical thinking and practice while avoiding the kinds of objections that traditional views struggle with.

3. Motivation and General Argumentative Strategy

Since constructivism is often framed in opposition to the realist response to the Euthyphro question it should not be surprising that one standard way of motivating constructivism is to present it as a response to the putative failings of realism in metaethics. But how we are to understand realism or anti-realism in metaethics is itself contested. This of course complicates things. If constructivism is presented as a response to realism but the commitments of realism are themselves contested, it would appear that in beginning with realism we are not beginning with the clearest framework for understanding constructivism. Despite this complication, however, this framework can still be useful. The situation just requires that we be explicit about how we are to understand the term “realism” in this context.

a. Constructivism versus Realism

It is fairly uncontroversial to take realism in metaethics to include at least the following two conditions:

(1) Atomic ethical statements are the kind of things that may be literally true or false.

(2) At least some of them, literally construed, are true.

These conditions look promising insofar as they serve to contrast realism with two commonly recognized non-realist competitors. The first condition contrasts the view with non-cognitivism. Defenders of these views deny that ethical statements are straightforwardly or literally fact-stating; they rather claim that we use ethical language to perform some non-descriptive function or to express some non-representational state of mind. The second condition contrasts the view with an error theory. Defenders of an error theoretic account of morality accept that we use ethical language to report beliefs but claim that all of these beliefs are systematically false because ethical terms and expressions fail to refer to anything. Again, both types of views are framed in opposition to realism. Insofar as (1) and (2) achieve this contrast, they provide a helpful way of understanding realism’s commitments.

These two conditions also appear sufficient to distinguish realism from some statements of constructivism. For example, Christine Korsgaard (2003) has described constructivism in ways that look incompatible with (1). On her account, ethical concepts do not refer to facts that we may come to know and apply in deliberation; rather, they refer to practical problems that agents must solve. The details of this proposal are not completely clear, but some have argued that Korsgaard’s view does not construe moral truth literally. If this were indeed the case, the first two conditions alone would suffice for distinguishing realism from constructivism.

Even if some statements of constructivism might be ruled out by these conditions, however, others are not. In fact, part of what many take to be attractive about constructivism is that it does satisfy these two conditions. By taking on board some of the features of realism and rejecting others, constructivists claim to capture all that is attractive about realism while avoiding standard objections against it. If constructivism failed to satisfy (1) or (2), a defender of the view could not claim any such advantage; for without them there is nothing of realism to speak of. This means that we need to add some other condition(s) to our account of realism, one or another that captures the distinction that these other constructivists have in mind.

Russ Shafer-Landau has proposed the following candidate:

(3) There are moral truths that obtain independently of any preferred perspective, in the sense that the moral standards that fix the moral facts are not made true by virtue of their ratification from within any actual or hypothetical perspective. (2003: 15)

This condition is used to describe what is sometimes referred to as the stance-independence of ethical facts and properties (for coinage of this expression, see Milo 1995). This is because it makes at least some instances of moral truth independent of “any preferred perspective”, actual or hypothetical. A perspective, or standpoint, is a complex system of intentional psychological states–or stances–such as beliefs, desires, commitments, reactive attitudes, and so forth.

According to (3), even if some ethical standards come into existence because they figure as the objects of our desires, or choices, or beliefs, and so forth, there are some that exist independently of our intentional stances. Importantly, this characterization of realism still allows that some of the reasons we have may be the result of choices and agreements we have made. For instance, it seems plausible to think that one can come to have special reasons to do things in virtue of the promises one makes and the specific intentions that this promise-making involves, reasons that one would fail to have in the absence of such promise-making. The realist can allow for this. However, she will insist that not all of the reasons one has are like this; importantly, there are also some we have independently of any of the desires, choices, or beliefs we have or the choices or agreements we have made. For example, she may insist that our reason to uphold the practice of promise-keeping in general is just such a stance-independent reason. In other words, while our reason to make good on a particular promise may depend on our having made this promise in the first place and the specific intentions that this involves, our reason to keep promises more generally would not depend on our having promised to do anything; rather, it is a reason we have that is independent of our attitudes or any perspective or standpoint which they might combine to form. We will soon have occasion to say more about what a perspective or standpoint is. For now, however, it is just important to note how this third condition serves to contrast realism with constructivism.

Unlike the first two conditions, this one does appear to get at the distinction many constructivists have in mind. Specifically, it would appear to give some substance to the intuitive sense of dependence implicit in the Euthyphro questions stated earlier. These questions suggest that constructivism differs from realism insofar as it makes ethical facts and properties depend on our ethical practice in some essential way.

If we accept that realism offers a stance-independent view of ethical facts and properties, constructivism ought to be understood by contrast as a species of a stance-dependent view. On this account, there are no moral, or ethical, truths that obtain entirely independently of any actual or hypothetical perspective. The standards that fix the relevant class of ethical facts are always made true by virtue of their ratification from within some actual or hypothetical perspective. Constructivists offer various characterizations of the relevant status-conferring perspective or standpoint as well as of the kind of ratification that is required. Some of these differences are discussed above in section 2.

Many constructivists accept (1) and (2), but argue that realists go too far in positing (3). This condition constitutes, in large part, the realist notion of ethical objectivity . For this reason, we might take constructivists to be rejecting the idea that ethical facts and properties are objective in the realist’s sense–while leaving open the possibility that they might count as objective in some other sense. Constructivists argue that by incorporating (3) realists fail to accommodate deeply held philosophical and ethical commitments. These failings fall under two broad categories.

b. Metaphysical and Epistemological Objections to Realism

The first supposed failing is that realism cannot accommodate our broader metaphysical and epistemological commitments. Here the concern is generally that realism about value, or morality, or reasons is incompatible with philosophical naturalism. Very roughly, this is the ontological thesis that the only kinds of facts and properties that exist are natural ones—that is, those facts and properties that (could) figure as the objects of investigation of our best scientific practices. The alleged problem is that ethical facts and properties could only satisfy condition (3) if naturalism were false.

There are two (related) versions of this argument in the literature. For example, according to one popular version of the objection made famous by J.L. Mackie (1977), ethical facts and properties exhibit certain necessary connections with our motivational capacities. This view is sometimes referred to as motivational internalism. If these motivational connections are understood naturalistically (for example, as connections between ethical judgments and an agent’s desires or dispositions to choose), it is hard to see how ethical facts and properties could enjoy the independence described in condition (3). They would have to be stance-independent by nature yet necessarily connected with certain motivational stances. The worry is that this would suggest, in the words of Mackie, that ethical facts and properties were “utterly different from anything else in the universe” (1977: 38). The conclusion here is that realism commits one to a kind of metaphysical queerness.

Mackie’s allegation of metaphysical queerness gives rise to a related concern about epistemological queerness. If ethical facts and properties are metaphysically different from anything else in the universe, why should we think that we could discover them in the same way we come to know natural facts and properties (that is, via observation and empirical theorizing)? Here the particular worry is that we could only come to know them via some mysterious faculty of intuition. Hence a queer metaphysics would require a queer epistemology.

While Mackie was the first to present these objections, there are also more recent versions of this kind of naturalistic argument–ones that respond to Mackie’s worries about queerness with a constructivist solution. For example, Street (2006) claims that realism is incompatible with our best evolutionary account of how we came to make the ethical judgments we do. According to this argument, if realism were true we would have no good explanation of how our ethical judgments have succeeded in matching (or “tracking”) stance-independent ethical truths; rather, the truth of these judgments would have to be entirely a matter of unlikely coincidence.

Constructivism, by contrast, is supposed to avoid these problems. By grounding ethical truths in features of intentional states, constructivists claim that their view makes use of only naturalistic materials, ones that can be accounted for by empirical psychology. These are features that may be appealed to in order to explain the apparent connection between ethical judgments and motivation. They might also help the constructivist avoid Street’s skeptical scenario. This is because the constructivist will argue that there is no serious gap between ethical judgment and truth that the skeptic may exploit.

Of course, these types of naturalistic concern alone do little to distinguish the constructivist challenge from others, such as the challenge error-theorists and expressivists mount against realism. In fact, it would appear as if every major challenge to realism incorporates some version of this worry. But this is not the only motivation to which constructivists appeal. This first type of concern is usually coupled with a second type.

c. Objections to Realism from within Ethical Theory

The second type of objection concerns realism’s failure to accommodate purportedly deep features of our first-order ethical thinking. These include many people’s commitment to the idea that there is a necessary connection between moral or evaluative judgments and reasons for action as well as the idea that autonomy is an essential and ineliminable aspect of our practical thinking. Unlike the first type of objection, which appeals to one’s broader philosophical commitments in metaphysics and epistemology, this objection comes from within ethical theory itself.

Many moral philosophers maintain, or are at least attracted to, a view called moral rationalism. According to this view an action’s rightness necessarily provides some reason to perform it; alternatively, an object’s or state-of-affair’s goodness necessarily provides some reason to pursue or promote it. These kinds of considerations arguably come from within first-order ethical theory, since the relata (rightness or goodness, on the one hand; reasons for action, on the other) are the proper objects of first-order ethical investigation.

Although rationalism per se is not incompatible with ethical realism–indeed defenders of a robust form of non-naturalist ethical realism also accept something like this view, it does pose problems for realism when it is combined with a non-realist account of practical reason. That is, in order to secure a non-realist conclusion, constructivists must combine an appeal to rationalism with a rejection of realism about practical reason. On this view, moral facts about rightness or evaluative facts about goodness necessarily entail certain reasons for action, but these reasons are not to be understood as objective, stance-independent facts that we come to know through ethical inquiry; rather, these reasons are determined (that is, “constructed”) by agents engaged in the activity of practical reasoning. For an example of this kind of view see Korsgaard (1996).

This rejection of realism about practical reasons together with a commitment to rationalism puts pressure on one to accept a stance-dependent account of morality and value, as well. For it is difficult to see why there should be a necessary connection between such different types of things (compare Shafer-Landau 2003: 48-49). Why should one think that the realist’s objective, stance-independent moral or evaluative facts necessarily correlate with the results of the stance-dependent outcomes of practical reasoning?

The constructivist rejection of realism about practical reason in turn either rests on an appeal to broader metaphysical or epistemological commitments, like naturalism (which the aforementioned realists reject), or other deeply entrenched first-order ethical convictions, like the importance of autonomy for rational agency (which arguably a realist should also be concerned to preserve).

As with the argument from rationalism, the argument from autonomy again appeals to a commonly-held commitment within ethical theory. The claim in this case is that autonomy is an essential and ineliminable feature of practical agency and that such autonomy requires a kind of control that is at odds with a realist account of practical reason (Korsgaard 1996). According to this argument, autonomous practical agency involves self-legislation–in the sense that practical agents are both the authors of the content of practical laws and the authors of their own obligation to uphold these laws. Constructivism in metaethics is supposed to be fully compatible with such a view of autonomous practical agency. But if a robust, stance-independent realism were true, we could not be said to legislate the content of practical laws or our own obligation to uphold these laws. Therefore, autonomy favors thinking that constructivism in metaethics is correct and that realism is mistaken. For criticism of this argument, see Shafer-Landau (2003) and Robert Stern (2012).

Defenders of constructivism disagree about which of these considerations (naturalism or rationalism or autonomy) poses the strongest challenge to realism. However, as these brief remarks here already illustrate, the arguments they advance conform to a general strategy: first, there is an appeal to one or another of these considerations; second, realism is presented as failing to adequately account for this particular consideration; finally, constructivism is presented as possessing of superior resources for explaining it. In short, the constructivist claims a series of explanatory advantages over realism. Although one might reject one or another of the constructivist’s arguments, the constructivist contends that her view wins out on holistic grounds. Even if realism can accommodate some of these considerations to some extent, the constructivist argues that her view does a better job on the whole. In other words, the constructivist claims to get you everything the realist wants (and more) without any of the problems that realism supposedly introduces.

4. Is Constructivism “Free-Standing”?

Regardless of whether constructivism succeeds in the above arguments, one might still worry that “constructivism” is merely a new label for another well-established view, one whose virtues and defects have already received much attention. Here we return to one of the issues about scope that we encountered earlier. One traditional worry is that much of what has been said thus far about constructivism appears as if it applies to a family of views that are sometimes referred to as response-dependence theories. Subsequently, both constructivists and non-constructivists alike have questioned constructivism’s cognitivist credentials and pressed for details as to how such a view might contrast with expressivism. Furthermore, one might worry that constructivists only succeed at distinguishing their view from expressivism or response-dependence theories to the extent that they construe it as a form of simple subjectivism, a naturalistically reductive view that makes ethical facts or properties a function of an agent’s desires. How is ethical constructivism different from such views? Is constructivism a distinct alternative to response-dependence theories, expressivism, and simple subjectivism? Or does it perhaps represent a species of one of them? Alternatively, might we take constructivism to be the family or genus under which these other views fall?

If constructivism merely turned out to be a version of one of these other views (either species or genus), this would arguably detract from its importance. Part of what is supposed to make the constructivist challenge to realism an interesting one is that it has not received the attention it deserves. This would arguably not be true if it turned out to be a version of a response-dependence theory, or expressivism, or simple subjectivism. Although questions remain as to how we are best to understand the commitments of these other views, they have each commanded a lot of discussion already. In light of this, the strengths and vulnerabilities of each type of view are fairly well established. Moreover, it is difficult to see how constructivism might serve as an improvement on any of these familiar positions–since some of the most compelling objections to each, respectively, are general enough that they would appear to extend to any of their species, constructivist or otherwise. The Frege-Geach problem for expressivism and extensional worries about response-dependence theories (each discussed below) are arguably examples of this. For this reason, it is important to sketch out a sense in which constructivism might count as a free-standing metaethical alternative to these views–that is, a sense in which constructivism counts as a genuinely novel metaethical position and not just another way of describing a more familiar view.

a. The Proceduralist Characterization

Perhaps due to the influence of Rawls, constructivism has typically been understood as the view that ethical truth is determined by the outcomes of procedures. The proceduralist characterization of constructivism has been accepted both by advocates like Milo (1995), Korsgaard (1996) and Street (2008) and by critics like Darwall et al. (1992), Enoch (2009), Ridge (2012) and Copp (2013).

This has led many to doubt whether constructivism represents a free-standing metaethical position. A proceduralist characterization of constructivism easily lends itself to formulation in terms of a familiar family of stance-dependent views in metaethics: response-dependence theories. As such, constructivism would appear to represent a species of such views and, consequently, be subject to the same objections.

Response-dependent views have been described in different ways. Some have defended a response-dependence view of ethical properties. We might take such views to provide the following schematic account of the essence of ethical properties (compare Johnston 1989):

x is C iff (and because) x is such as to produce R in Ss under conditions K

Here C stands in for some ethical property (for example, the property of goodness, wrongness, being a reason), S the subject, K the relevant conditions, and R the response. In order for this equation to pick out a response-dependent property, there are other conditions that must also obtain. For example, the biconditional cannot obtain trivially in virtue of S, K, and R specifying a “whatever it takes” condition. But, side stepping the controversies involved in specifying such conditions, it is already apparent why one might take constructivism to represent a species of such views. The proceduralist characterization lends itself to formulation in terms of subjects, responses, and conditions. For example, Rawls’s statement of a constructivist view of justice might be made to fit the response-dependence schema in the following way.

A policy/institution, x, is just iff (and because) x conforms to principles that would be agreed to by free and equal citizens under the conditions represented in the original position.

Here, C is the property of justness. R is the disposition to produce agreement, a volitional response. S is a free and equal citizen of a society. K is the conditions described in the original position. There may be renderings of Kantian constructivism about justice that better capture Rawls’s view. The point here is just to illustrate how a view that focuses on procedures lends itself to an interpretation in response-dependence terms. In fact Rawls’s statement of constructivism is not unique. The constructivist proposals of T.M. Scanlon and Christine Korsgaard would also appear amenable to a response-dependence formulation.

But if ethical constructivism is best understood as a response-dependence view, as these examples suggest, it would not represent a free-standing metaethical view. Furthermore, it would appear to be subject to the same objections that have been levelled against these views. Different philosophers have recognized a dilemma for response-dependence theories (Blackburn 1993; Darwall et al. 1992), as follows.

We may understand a response-dependence account as providing either a non-reductive or a reductive account of some class of ethical properties. If it is non-reductive (that is, it includes some ethical terms on the right-hand side of the equation), the account will leave traditional metaethical questions unresolved. Specifically, it will not tell us how we are to understand the ethical terms employed in the account, leaving open the possibility that they may take a realist, or expressivist, or error-theoretic, and so forth, interpretation. If it is reductive (that is, it includes no ethical terms on the right-hand side), the account runs the risk of being extensionally inadequate. In other words, the account cannot guarantee that the outcomes will match our considered ethical convictions. In the case of constructivism, this might be expressed as the worry that the subjects of the relevant procedures, actual or hypothetical, might get things wrong. A second related worry concerns the intensional adequacy of such views. Here the objection is that reductive accounts would make the ethical facts “hostage to the outcome of irrelevant causal processes” (Street 2010: 374), irrelevant because our ethical judgments themselves might not appear to be about such agents and their judgments.

A defender of the proceduralist characterization might argue that constructivism provides some new way of navigating around this dilemma. But it difficult to see how it could. The features of a response-dependence view that make it vulnerable to the dilemma are general and appear, as such, to apply equally to a proceduralist interpretation of constructivism.

A more promising response, perhaps, would be for the constructivist to accept one of the horns but argue that the associated objection is not as bad as one might think. But this type of response is also available to defenders of response-dependence views more generally. It still would not provide us with any reason for thinking that constructivism was a free-standing metaethical view; rather, it would appear as if constructivism and response-dependence theories (in general) stand or fall together. If constructivism is to represent a free-standing view it cannot be construed in terms of procedures. This has led defenders of the view to reject the proceduralist characterization and emphasize the ways in which constructivism differs from response-dependence theories.

b. The Standpoint Characterization

Sharon Street (2010) has argued that constructivism is best understood as a distinct and superior alternative to response-dependence views in metaethics. She describes metaethical constructivism as the view that

…the truth of a normative claim consists in that claim’s being entailed from within the practical point of view, where the practical point of view is given a formal characterization. (2010: 369)

Street’s account explicitly avoids any characterization of constructivism in terms of procedures. Again, if constructivism specifies a procedure, this leaves the view open to the dilemma just sketched. From this one might infer that the solution is to avoid talk of procedures (compare also James 2007). So the constructivist retreats from talk of procedural outcomes to what is alleged to be the less problematic, talk of points of view, or standpoints.

Street illustrates the difference by appeal to an example about baseball and how response-dependence and constructivist views would differ in their response to the question What is it for Jeter to be safe? Whereas the former would state the conditions for Jeter’s being safe (a normative fact in baseball) in terms of the responses of an umpire (a good umpire would judge him to be safe), the latter states the conditions in terms of what would be entailed by the rules of baseball in combination with the non-normative facts. Street argues that this formally-construed constructivist alternative is immune to the standard objections that befall reductive response-dependence accounts. On the one hand, it yields the right results; it is extensionally adequate. Unlike the response-dependence view it leaves no room for errors of judgment. On the other, it would appear to capture the sense of what it is for Jeter to be safe. That is to say, it is also, on Street’s view, intensionally adequate.

But what is a standpoint? Although many philosophers appeal to standpoints (especially those working in the Kantian tradition), there is very little detailed discussion of what they are. For example, Street describes the practical point of view as

…the point of view occupied by any creature who takes at least some things in the world to be good or bad, better or worse, required or optional, worthy or worthless, and so on–the standpoint of a being who judges, whether at a reflective or unreflective level that some things call for, demand, or provide reasons for others. (2010: 366)

This description presupposes that we already start out with some sense of what such a standpoint is. Other descriptions of standpoints appeal to metaphor or invoke a distinction between the practical and the theoretical, each of which is supposed to represent a distinct and familiar way of experiencing the world (Wallace 2008).

Let us assume that a standpoint is constituted by a complex system of stances (that is, psychological states that we bear towards things and that, in virtue of being directed towards these things, have a kind of content) such as beliefs, desires, commitments, reactive attitudes, and so forth. In other words, it is a set of individual stances that hang together in a certain way. This much would appear safe if we are correct in understanding the distinction between realism and constructivism in terms of stance-dependence. But if we are to avoid the response-dependence dilemma, it is important that these stances not be described as issuing from any particular type of subject under specific conditions. One alternative would be to focus on the kinds of activities associated with various practical standpoints. Here the idea is that we first look to those familiar activities of, for example, valuing, taking something to be wrong, taking something to be a reason for acting, in order to identify the relevant practical standpoint and then ask what it is to engage in these activities as such.

Korsgaard (2003), James (2007) and Street (2010) describe the constructivist project as one of working out the “constitutive commitments” of various practical standpoints. This involves, amongst other things, the task of specifying the various ways in which particular types of stances must hang together so that one may count as genuinely engaging in a particular practical activity as such.

For example, stances can presumably either support or conflict with one another. Conflicting stances are ones that are in some sense inconsistent with each other. Although Katie may consistently take herself to have both some reason to attend the concert and some reason not to, she may not consistently take herself to have both an all-things-considered reason to attend and an all-things-considered reason not to. Someone who simultaneously maintains these stances arguably fails to meet the basic requirements for taking something to be an all-things-considered reason for acting. This kind of conflict illustrates perhaps the most straightforward sense in which practical stances may count as inconsistent. But there are other ways, too.

Consider someone who takes herself to have an all-things-considered reason to save her life, believes that in order to do so it is necessary that she see a doctor immediately, but takes herself to have no reason whatsoever to see a doctor (compare Street 2008: 227-228). These stances are also in some sense inconsistent with one another. As in the earlier example, someone who simultaneously maintains these stances arguably fails to meet the basic requirements for taking something to be an all-things-considered reason for acting.

A standpoint constructivist might claim that this is because the activity of taking-something-to-be-a-reason-for-acting as such is in part constituted by a norm of instrumental consistency, one that requires that one take oneself to have at least some reason to take the necessary means to one’s ends. As both Street and Korsgaard point out, someone who fails in these ways is not making a mistake about what her reasons are; rather, she does not genuinely count as taking herself to have an all-things-considered reason at all. But consistency is not the only kind of relation that one might take to matter.

Those stances that do not conflict may stand in various degrees of support to each other. Among a set of mutually consistent stances, some will be more central to a particular standpoint, others more peripheral. The extent to which stances on balance exhibit support of one another is a measure of their coherence. By comparison with consistency, it is more difficult to say how coherence might figure as a constitutive requirement for a particular standpoint. Presumably, one either does or does not count as occupying a standpoint; it is an all or nothing affair. But coherence comes in degrees. Surely one may count as genuinely engaging various practical standpoints even if the relations amongst one’s set of stances falls short of maximal coherence. But what if they fell short of minimal coherence?

Coherence might figure as a threshold requirement. Consider someone who is deliberating about whether to attend a party. She considers who will be there, whether there will be dancing, how she will feel the next morning, how this might affect her work schedule, and so forth. After much reflection she concludes “I have an all-things-considered reason to book a flight to Tokyo!” Although there is nothing apparently inconsistent with her taking up this stance, it does not mesh in any way (let us assume) with the considerations she has been entertaining. It fails to cohere with them in any obvious way. Someone who takes up this stance in the present situation arguably fails to count as taking herself to have an all-things-considered reason. Here we might say that the relation this stance bears to the background of the agent’s other stances exhibits a degree of coherence that falls below the threshold that is constitutively required to be counted as engaging in the activity as such.

Coherence might not be the only relation that matters in this way. There may turn out to be different constitutive norms whose satisfaction contributes to a standpoint’s overall coherence. Part of the constructivist project will involve describing what other types of norms or relations are constitutive of various practical standpoints. For example, James (2007) has claimed that the standpoint of practical reason is constituted by certain general norms which determine, among other things, which facts one should attend to in deliberation (a “norm of attention direction”), which to disregard (a “norm of disregard”), which to count as favoring a particular response (a “norm of favoring”), and which to assign more or less importance (a “norm of balancing”). Like the norm of coherence, but unlike the norm of instrumental consistency, these norms would also appear to allow satisfaction to various degrees.

Once the constructivist has an account of these various constitutive commitments in hand, she can then appeal to them to explain the truth or falsity of a particular ethical judgment. According to the standpoint characterization of constructivism, the truth of an ethical judgment is a function of what follows from within a particular practical standpoint. In other words, the truth of a particular ethical judgment is always to be understood as relative to the various relations and norms that constitute a particular practical standpoint. Given a particular collection of stances and the norms governing a particular standpoint, certain stances will follow, others will be ruled out, and still others will enjoy some degree of support but fall short of being “entailed” from within a particular ethical standpoint. This brief sketch leaves many questions unanswered. But it should already allow us to see how constructivists, like Street, might appeal to a standpoint characterization to distinguish their views from the family of response-dependence theories.

Importantly, our judgments about a particular practical standpoint are not about how some subject–actual or hypothetical–would respond; nor are they about how such agents ought to respond. The dilemma for response-dependence views is a result of the way in which these views describe ethical truths indirectly. On these views, the truth of an ethical judgment is described in terms of how some “suitably represented” agent would respond. This allows for a gap between our intuitive ethical judgments and our judgments about how such agents would respond. On the one hand, the agent could get things wrong; on the other, our ethical judgments themselves (the direct ones) might not appear to be about such agents and their judgments. The move to standpoints is supposed to close this gap.

According to the standpoint characterization of constructivism, an ethical judgment is not about what some suitably represented agent would judge or choose. Rather, it is about what follows from within a particular ethical standpoint. In contrast with response-dependence views, the standpoint does not represent an agent. Hence, there is no one who could get things wrong. Moreover, such a standpoint does not reduce ethical judgments to anything else; this is supposed to make it immune to “open question” worries about the account’s intensional adequacy.

One might worry that the extent to which the standpoint characterization succeeds in distinguishing constructivism from response-dependence views is also the extent to which the view starts to look like other existing metaethical alternatives: realism, expressivism, or a simple subjectivism. Suppose that what distinguishes constructivism from response-dependence views is that on the former view ethical judgments are about what follows from within a particular standpoint and not how a certain type of subject would respond under suitable conditions. If this is the case, it is clear how constructivism might count as a version of cognitivism. Ethical judgments are a species of belief, ones that report facts about what follows from within a particular ethical standpoint. But how are we to understand the nature of the “primitive” stances that make up these standpoints? So far, all that we have been told is that they are not about a suitably represented subject’s responses.

c. Ridge’s Argument by Elimination

Michael Ridge (2012) presents a serious challenge to recent efforts to find a plausible, novel, and free-standing version of constructivism in metaethics–one that is especially troublesome for defenders of the standpoint characterization. His argument is one that proceeds by elimination. Ridge exhaustively lists the various ways in which we might understand an agent’s primitive ethical stances and then argues that the forms of constructivism each generates fail to constitute a novel or free-standing alternative to familiar metaethical positions. Ridge counts five options. Due to restrictions of space, however, the following presentation takes a more schematic approach.

According to the standpoint view, ethical judgments are two-tiered. At the second tier, ethical judgments express beliefs about what follows from within a particular ethical standpoint. But how are we to understand the “primitive” first tier judgments or stances–the ones that make up a standpoint? What are they? Do they have their own representational content or are they non-representational states of mind? These questions are crucial for determining whether constructivism represents a free-standing view. Yet it is not clear that the standpoint constructivist can answer them in a way that succeeds in distinguishing her view from familiar alternatives.

Suppose that the first-tier stances are a species of belief. That is, they have representational content. What do these first-tier stances purportedly represent? There would only appear to be two options. Either they represent features of the world that are independent of these beliefs, or they represent one’s other first-tier beliefs. But neither of these options is a promising way of establishing constructivism as a free-standing metaethical position.

On the one hand, if the first-tier beliefs represent features of the world that obtain independently of our stances (that is, stance-independent ethical facts), the view just turns out to be a version of realism. For, in this case, there are at least some ethical judgments whose truth does not ultimately depend on the relations they bear to other stances within a particular ethical standpoint; rather, some will ultimately depend on the relation they bear to the world. On the other hand, if they represent one or another of the other first-tier beliefs that constitute the standpoint, the view may avoid realism. But, in this case, the worry is that this makes the view either vacuous or objectionably circular.

So far, we have been supposing that the first-tier stances are something like beliefs. But, what if they have some kind of non-representational content, how do we understand the states of mind that these basic ethical stances embody?

Suppose that the first-tier stances embody some non-representational state of mind. Considering some of the motivations to which constructivists appeal, one might assume that these basic stances embody a form of pro-attitude, like desires. But if one is able to work out the constitutive relations amongst this class of non-representational pro-attitudes, one will have arguably succeeded in one of the projects central to expressivism.

One of the big challenges for expressivists, the so-called “Frege-Geach problem”, is to explain how ethical discourse exhibits standard logical inference patterns despite the fact that ethical language is not fact-stating, on their view. Standard logical inference is truth preserving. But expressivists do not think that ethical language is used to express truth-evaluable content. So expressivists must come up with an alternative “practical logic” which shows that it is nonetheless legitimate to use ethical language in these ways. Expressivists have offered different proposals, but they remain extremely controversial.

Constructivism is usually understood as a version of cognitivism. This is because it makes ethical judgment, at some level, a species of belief. In particular, the standpoint constructivist understands the second-tier ethical stances this way. They are beliefs about what follows from within the various practical standpoints. They have truth-evaluable content and, as such, should figure unproblematically in contexts which require such content (belief reports, truth-preserving inferences, and so forth). This might create the impression that constructivism will be immune to the kinds of objections that expressivists face. But if the stances that constitute these standpoints are themselves non-representational, it would appear that constructivism is saddled with the same project as expressivism, at least at the level of the first-tier ethical stances.

If certain non-representational stances are supposed to follow from within a particular standpoint constituted by other non-representational stances, we must suppose that the relations amongst these stances constitute a structure with its own non-truth-preserving “practical logic” (compare Gibbard 1997). It is only once this logic is worked out that a constructivist will be able to say whether a particular second-order stance–in this case a belief–is true or not. If this is indeed the way to understand the standpoint constructivist’s apparatus, one might object that the view does no better, or even perhaps worse than expressivism. In fact, an expressivist might argue that the constructivist ought to avoid the complication of an additional tier of judgments and simply abandon cognitivism altogether; instead, she should take ethical statements to directly express the non-representational states of mind that constitute the various ethical standpoints. This would in effect make the view a species of expressivism.

This is a line that become increasing popular in the early 21^st century. Several defenders of expressivism have argued that constructivism is best understood as a species of, or supplement to, their view–see Gibbard (1997), Lenman (2010), Ridge (2012). It has even been encouraged by some constructivists–including Korsgaard (2003) and, to a lesser extent, Street (2008, 2010).

But if constructivism is indeed best understood this way it arguably loses in importance as a challenger to realism. The expressivist challenge to realism is both familiar and fairly well understood. Moreover, a constructivist-expressivism would arguably present a weaker challenge than the existing “quasi-realist” versions advanced by expressivists like Blackburn. Not only would a defender of constructivist-expressivism be giving up on cognitivism, she would also be giving up on even the appearance that ethical discourse is stance-independent. Quasi-realist expressivists are at least concerned to accommodate realist ways of talking and thinking about objectivity in ethics. Recall that one of the motivations for constructivism is that the view is purportedly able to secure everything the realist wants without the problems that realism allegedly introduces. But someone who defends this kind of constructivism arguably fails to secure anything the realist wants. Although such a view might represent an interesting internal challenge for expressivists, it would not appear to present a novel or especially plausible challenge to realism. But the only apparent way around this objection risks making constructivism into a version of another well-known metaethical position.

Any version of constructivism that characterizes ethical standpoints in terms of non-representational stances will have a problem distinguishing itself as a free-standing view. In order to see why, let us suppose that the constructivist denies that an ethical standpoint involves a level of structure that would require a practical logic. This would position the view closer to a simple form of subjectivism– for example, a view that takes moral judgments to express beliefs about which acts would maximally satisfy an agent’s actual desires. In this case, one might also describe this form of subjectivism as providing a two-tiered account of ethical judgments. At the first-tier there are desires, a kind of non-representational stance; at the second-tier there are beliefs about these desires. Furthermore, one might argue that such a view, like a standpoint constructivism, is distinct from the family of response-dependence theories.

According to simple subjectivism, ethical judgment is not about how certain subjects would respond; rather, it is about whether an action satisfies one’s actual desires, and how many or, alternatively, how strong these are. Importantly, however, the subjectivist does not take the second-tier judgments to be about what follows amongst an agent’s desires; rather, they express beliefs about how many desires on balance would be satisfied, or frustrated, by a particular course of action. Such a view arguably does not require any logic. Although an agent’s set of desires may exhibit some structure–for example, with some desires taking other desires as their objects, or some desires being more general and others specifications of them–it does not involve a level of sophistication that would support “entailment” claims. Consequently, the challenges associated with expressivism do not arise.

Simple subjectivism provides a model for how a constructivist might avoid the kind of difficulties associated with the expressivist’s project. Of course, the problem with this approach is that it requires that the constructivist explain how her view represents a novel and interesting advance on common versions of simple subjectivism. One might have thought that the extent to which constructivism represents an improvement on such theories is the extent to which the view incorporates structure at the level of first-tier ethical stances (compare Street 2008: 230-1).

There would appear to be a dilemma for a constructivist who insists that first-tier stances are non-representational. Either these stances combine to create a structure within which some stances may be said to follow from others, in which case the view involves the same difficulties that expressivism does. Or a standpoint is to be understood as a mere collection of stances without any sophisticated structure, in which case the view starts to look like a version of simple subjectivism, with all the virtues and vices that such views carry.

The prospect of a freestanding metaethical constructivism is looking dim. The standard proceduralist characterizations give the appearance that constructivism is best understood as a version of a response-dependence theory. This might make the standpoint characterization appear more promising. But if an ethical standpoint is constituted by beliefs, constructivism either folds into realism or turns out to be vacuous. If it is constituted by non-representational stances, it is best interpreted as a species of, or supplement to, expressivism or a version of a simple subjectivism. Unless constructivism can be shown to represent an advance on one of these alternatives, the view would appear to lack in motivation. Nothing that has been said thus far rules out this possibility. But even if constructivism represented an improvement on response-dependence theories or expressivism or simple subjectivism, it may still fail to represent any new or interesting challenge to realism. One would have to show that constructivism improves on these other views in ways that also make for a more formidable challenge to realism. Perhaps the more promising option would be to give up on the claim that constructivism represents a free-standing metaethical view and argue that the challenge presented by constructivism is of a different sort.

5. A Challenge to Traditional Metaethics

One such recent proposal locates what is novel and important about the constructivist challenge in the Kantian distinction between practical and theoretical reason. Defenders of this interpretation of constructivism in metaethics include Christine Korsgaard (2003), Stephen Engstrom (2013), and Carla Bagnoli (2013). They argue that traditional approaches in metaethics understand practical reasoning as a kind of “applied” theoretical reasoning but that this fails to appreciate the distinctively practical nature of deliberation and choice.

Traditional debates in metaethics typically recognize a number of platitudes about the nature of moral discourse and experience. Two of the most prominent of these include the common ideas (i) that there are correct answers to normative questions and that these correct answers are made correct by objective normative facts and (ii) that our judgments about the correct answers to normative questions are themselves sufficient to motivate us to act under normal circumstances (Smith 1994: 6-7).

However, traditional approaches in metaethics have struggled to adequately account for both of these features in a non-mysterious way. This, again, is the problem of “queerness” that Mackie identified and that we have discussed above in section 3b. As a result, we find some traditional views in metaethics that emphasize the objectivity of ethics but sacrifice or downplay the connection between normative judgment and motivation; others emphasize the motivational connection but sacrifice or downplay the objectivity of ethics.

The proposed constructivist response to this dilemma involves rejecting the underlying understanding of practical reasoning as a kind of “applied” theoretical reasoning, together with its “ontological” conception of objectivity in ethics. Theoretical reasoning attempts to acquire knowledge of facts that exist prior to and independent of its activity. It is the independent existence of these facts that makes theoretical reasoning objective. Bagnoli describes this as an ontological conception of objectivity because objectivity here depends on the existence of a special class of facts. But she and other constructivist critics argue that the same feature which constitutes the objectivity of theoretical reasoning also makes this kind of objectivity unsuitable for practical reasoning. For practical reasoning is ultimately concerned with deliberation and action; its verdicts carry a special authority that has the force, under normal conditions, to move us to act.

According to the constructivist critique, traditional approaches in metaethics conceive of practical reasoning as an attempt to gain theoretical knowledge of prior and independent normative facts and then apply this knowledge in deliberation. But it is precisely this theoretical conception of objectivity as “external” that would appear to be at odds with the “internal” authority and motivational power of practical judgments. It is difficult to see why an ontology of prior and independent normative facts should generate reasons that are authoritative and efficacious from within the practical standpoint of someone deciding what to do. As Korsgaard (1996, 2003) argues, one can always ask why one has reason to do what the prior and independent normative facts indicate that one should do. If this is the case, one might think that the underlying account of practical reason has failed to do its job.

In contrast to the ontological conception of objectivity, Korsgaard, Engstrom, and Bagnoli each argue in their own way for a “practical” conception of objectivity in ethics. They agree that a successful account of practical reason will be one that explains the normative authority and motivational force of practical judgments in terms of the special objectivity that is constitutive of the activity of practical reasoning itself. These constructivists follow Kant in characterizing ethical objectivity in terms of the constitutive conditions of rational agency and the specific form of practical reasoning that this involves. According to the kind of Kantian constructivism they advance, practical reasoning is an activity with its own internal constraints. In particular, it is an autonomous form of activity. This means that it is both an activity that must be objective and one whose objectivity cannot come from an external source (compare Kant 1998).

This is where the constructivist interpretation of autonomy as a form of self-legislation comes into play. On this view, one is subject only to those laws that one has legislated oneself. As laws the results of self-legislation must take a special universal form that constitutes their objectivity. As self-legislated these laws are not external to one’s own practical reasoning and hence are able to provide a source of practical authority. In deciding what to do, one is at once aware of oneself as both the author and the subject of the normative demands on which one acts.

Some claim that this conception of practical objectivity succeeds where the ontological conception fails: namely, that it is able to ground the normative authority and motivational efficacy of practical judgments. The idea is that in order to be a rational agent one must act on certain kinds of universal principles or reasons. Strictly speaking, failure to act on these principles or reasons does not mean that one acts badly; rather, it means that one fails to be a rational agent or act at all. Hence, insofar as one is to count as a rational agent or act all, one must necessarily take these principles or reasons as decisive.

Does this account of practical objectivity also succeed in establishing constructivism as a genuinely novel and free-standing alternative to traditional approaches in metaethics? It is not clear. Although this form of Kantian constructivism does appear to establish an important distinction between constructivist and traditional understandings of practical reason, one might argue that these claims about the relation between objectivity and practical authority nonetheless belong to a first-order inquiry into the demands of practical reason (Hussain and Shah 2006). If this is the case, both realists and expressivists may plausibly argue that they are able to help themselves to the same resources that constructivists have developed. Moreover, by shifting the focus of metaethical debates away from traditional semantic and metaphysical concerns, one might object that these constructivists have merely changed the subject.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Classical Statements of Constructivism

Darwall, Stephen and Gibbard, Allan and Railton, Peter. 1992. “Toward a Fin de siecle Ethics: Some Trends.” Philosophical Review 101: 115-189.
- This article provides a history of developments in metaethics over the past hundred years and presents the state-of-the-art at the end of the Twentieth Century. It devotes brief, though influential, discussion to constructivism as a form of hypothetical proceduralism.
Kant, Immanuel. 1998. Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals. Trans. by Mary J. Gregor. New York: Cambridge University Press.
- Some defenders of constructivism find inspiration for their views in Kant’s discussion of autonomy as a self-legislation.
Korsgaard, Christine. 1996. The Sources of Normativity. Cambridge: Cambridge UP.
- Korsgaard argues that constructivism (or “procedural realism”) is the only metaethical position that can adequately accommodate the normative force of practical reasons and morality. This work is considered, along with the work of Rawls, one of the most important early presentations of the constructivism.
Milo, Ronald. 1995. “Contractarian Constructivism.” Journal of Philosophy 92: 181-204.
- Here, Milo coins the term “stance-dependence” and develops a metaethical interpretation of the constructivism one finds in Rawls’s work.
O’Neill, Onora. 1989. Constructions of Reason: Explorations of Kant’s Practical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- O’Neill devotes a chapter of this work to responding to objections to Rawls’s view by sketching a more genuinely Kantian form of constructivism. She suggests that this view helps to illuminate the space that might exist between realist and relativist positions in metaethics.
Plato. 1997. Euthyphro. In Plato: Complete Works, John Cooper and D.S. Hutchinson (eds.), G.M.A. Grube (trans.), pp. 1-16.
- This short dialogue presents the famous Euthyphro Question.
Rawls, John. 1971/1999. A Theory of Justice. Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP.
- This is Rawls’s first full statement of justice as fairness; it includes detailed presentation of and arguments for the original position as the relevant choice procedure for determining principles of justice.
Rawls, John. 1980. “Kantian Constructivism in Moral Theory.” Journal of Philosophy 77: 515-572.
- This work is generally considered the locus classicus for contemporary discussions of constructivism in metaethics.
Rawls, John. 1993/1996. Political Liberalism. New York: Columbia UP.
- Here, Rawls presents his mature interpretation of justice as fairness as a form of political constructivism and contrasts this with his earlier Kantian interpretation.
Scanlon, T.M. 1998. What We Owe to Each Other. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Scanlon defends a form of local constructivism (“contractualism”) about morality.

b. Later Statements of Constructivism

Bagnoli, Carla. 2013a. “Constructivism about Practical Knowledge.” In Bagnoli, Carla (ed.): 153-182.
- Bagnoli rejects an ontological conception of objectivity for practical reason and develops an alternative “practical” conception of objectivity grounded in knowledge of oneself as an agent.
Engstrom, Stephen. 2013. “Constructivism and Practical Knowledge.” In Bagnoli, Carla (ed.): 133-152.
- Engstrom locates Kantian constructivism in an ancient tradition of theories of practical reason and contrasts this with two dominant modern approaches–rationalism and empiricism.
Galvin, Richard. 2010. “Rounding Up the Usual Suspects: Varieties of Kantian Constructivism in Ethics.” Philosophical Quarterly 61: 16-36.
- Galvin provides a taxonomy for categorizing different forms of Kantian constructivism and devotes special discussion to the objections that metaethical forms of the view face.
James, Aaron. 2007. “Constructivism about Practical Reasons.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 74: 302-25.
- James defends an explanatory yet non-procedural characterization of constructivism about practical reasons.
Korsgaard, Christine. 2003. “Realism and Constructivism in Twentieth-Century Moral Philosophy.” Journal of Philosophical Research APA Centennial Supplement: 99-122.
- Korsgaard argues that practical reasoning is not to be understood as a kind of “applied” theoretical reasoning. On her account, ethical concepts do not refer to facts that we come to know but, rather, to practical problems that agents must solve.
LeBar, Mark. 2008. “Aristotelian Constructivism.” Social Philosophy and Policy 25: 182-213.
- Lebar argues that an Aristotelian form of constructivism that grounds the truth of ethical judgments in our further judgments about what it is to live well avoids some of the standard objections to Kantian forms of the view and is generally a better framework for defending a thoroughgoing metaethical constructivism.
Lenman, James. 2010. “Humean Constructivism in Moral Theory.” Oxford Studies in Metaethics 5: 175-193.
- Lenman sketches a Humean form of constructivism that he argues may serve as a suitably naturalistic compliment to metaethical expressivism.
O’Neill, Onora. 2003. “Constructivism vs. Contractualism.” Ratio (new series) XVI 4 December, pp. 319-331.
- This article compares and contrasts Rawls’s constructivism with Scanlon’s contractualism and concludes that, once their underlying positions are more fully understood, it may make better sense to view Rawls as a contractualist and Scanlon as a constructivist than vice versa.
Silk, Alex. 2014. “Nietzschean Constructivism: Ethics and Metaethics for All and None.” Inquiry, pp. 1-37.
- Silk defends a Nietzschean form of constructivism that he thinks can both explain away an apparent tension in Nietzsche’s own writings and serve as a contender in contemporary metaethics.
Street, Sharon. 2006. “A Darwinian Dilemma for Realist Theories of Value.” Philosophical Studies 127, no. 1: 109-166.
- Here, Street argues that realism is incompatible with our best evolutionary explanations of how we came to have the evaluative attitudes we do.
Street, Sharon. 2008. “Constructivism about Reasons.” Oxford Studies in Metaethics 3: 207-45.
- Street sketches the form that a “thoroughgoing”, metaethical constructivism must take against the backdrop of more familiar “restricted” constructivist views, like those presented in the works of Rawls and Scanlon.
Street, Sharon. 2009. “In Defense of Future Tuesday Indifference: Ideally Coherent Eccentrics and the Contingency of What Matters.” Philosophical Issues (a supplement to Nous) vol. 19, ed. Ernest Sosa, pp. 273-298.
- Street works through a series of case studies of characters from recent moral philosophy (including an ideally coherent Caligula) that are supposed to present a challenge for a constructivist understanding of ethical objectivity. She argues that careful consideration of these cases shows them to be far less counter-intuitive than is often alleged by constructivists’ opponents.
Street, Sharon. 2010. “What is Constructivism in Ethics and Metaethics?” Philosophy Compass 5/5, pp. 363-384.
- Street presents a taxonomy of constructivist positions and argues that a standpoint characterization of constructivism offers a free-standing alternative to familiar metaethical positions: including realism, response-dependence theories, and expressivism.

c. Critics of Constructivism

Brink, David. 1989. Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- In an appendix to this work, Brink presents a careful exegesis of Rawls’s Kantian constructivism in the Dewey Lectures and argues that, contrary to what Rawls appears to argue, a coherence theory of justification in ethics does not commit one to anti-realism in metaethics.
Copp, David. 2013. “Is Constructivism an Alternative to Moral Realism?” In Bagnoli, Carla (ed.), pp. 108-132.
- Copp argues that the distinction between constructivism and realism is philosophically uninteresting and threatens to distract theorists from more pressing issues, like the nature of normativity and the relation between truth and cognitivism.
Enoch, David. 2009. “Can there be a Global, Interesting, Coherent Constructivism about Practical Reason?” Philosophical Explorations vol. 12, no. 3, pp. 319-339.
- Enoch articulates what it would be mean for there to be a global constructivist position and argues that such a view, though not strictly inconsistent, threatens to make practical deliberation impossible.
Fitzpatrick, William. 2005. “The Practical Turn in Ethical Theory: Korgaard’s Constructivism, Realism and the Nature of Normativity.” Ethics 115, pp. 651-691.
- Fitzpatrick reveals crucial ambiguities in Korsgaard’s argument for the claim that the normative force of practical principles can only be secured by constructivism–and, thus, requires one to reject realism. He argues that the most plausible ways of remedying these deficiencies in her argument turn out to be compatible with realism.
Gibbard, Allan. 1999. “Morality as Consistency in Living: Korsgaard’s Kantian Lectures.” Ethics 110, pp. 140-164.Hussain and Shah. 2006
- Gibbard objects that Korsgaard’s constructivism cannot secure substantive universal moral demands from merely formal requirements of consistency.
Hussain, Nadeem and Nishi Shah. 2006. “Misunderstanding Metaethics: Korsgaard’s Rejection of Realism.” In Oxford Studies in Metaethics vol. 1, R. Shafer-Landau (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 265-294.
- Hussain and Shah argue that Korsgaard’s constructivism is best understood as a first-order ethical theory about the relationship between morality and practical reason and not as a free-standing alternative to realism or other familiar metaethical positions
Ridge, Michael. 2012. “Kantian Constructivism: Something Old, Something New.” In Lenman, James and Shemmer, Yonatan (eds.): 138-158.
- Ridge argues by elimination that constructivism is not a free-standing alternative in metaethics.
Shafer-Landau, Russ. 2003. Moral Realism: a Defense. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- In this work, Shafer-Landau devotes a chapter to presenting and responding to constructivist arguments against realism.
Stern, Robert. 2012. “Constructivism and the Argument from Autonomy.” In Lenman, James and Shemmer, Yonatan (eds.): 119-137.
- Stern reconstructs and evaluates three distinct constructivist arguments against realism that take as their central premise the idea that realism is incompatible with agential autonomy.
Timmons, Mark. 2003. “The Limits of Moral Constructivism.” Ratio 16: 391-423.
- Timmons teases out the contours of a kind of contractualist constructivism that he finds in the work of Scanlon and argues that such a view is vulnerable to an objectionable form of relativism.

d. Collections of Essays

Bagnoli, Carla (ed.) 2013b. Constructivism in Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Lenman, James and Shemmer, Yonatan (eds.) 2012. Constructivism in Practical Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.

e. Other Related Work in Metaethics

Blackburn, Simon. 1984. Spreading the Word: Groundings in the Philosophy of Language. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- This is a comprehensive introduction to the philosophy of language in which, amongst other things, Blackburn defends a quasi-realist expressivism for evaluative language.
Blackburn, Simon. 1993. “Circles, Finks, Smells, and Biconditionals.” Philosophical Perspectives 7, pp. 259-279.
- Blackburn presents one standard objection to response-dependence theories.
Fitzpatrick, William. 2008. “Robust Ethical Realism, Non-Naturalism and Normativity.” In Oxford Studies in Metaethics, vol. 3, R. Shafer-Landau (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 159-205.
- Fitzpatrick presents and defends a robustly realist and non-naturalist view in metaethics.
Johnston, Mark. 1989. “Dispositional theories of value.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society suppl. vol. 62, pp. 139-174.
- This is an example of a response-dependence account of evaluative concepts.
Mackie, J.L. 1977. Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. London: Penguin Books.
- The first chapter of this book is where Mackie introduces his famous Argument from Queerness and advances an error theory in metaethics.
Railton, Peter. 1996. “Moral Realism: Prospects and Problem.” In Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 49-81.
- Railton presents a general taxonomy for realism across different discourses and then asks whether there is a form of moral realism that is able to accommodate standard features of our moral experience.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey. 1988. “Introduction: The Many Moral Realisms.” In Essays on Moral Realism, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, pp. 1-23.
- This article presents another standard way of taxonomizing metaethical positions.
Smith, Michael. The Moral Problem. Oxford: Blackwell.
- Smith presents a set of platitudes about morality which together generate a puzzle for philosophers interested in metaethics.
Wallace, R. Jay. 2008. “Practical Reason.” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Edward N. Zalta (ed.)
This article discusses the various ways of understanding the standpoint of practical reason.

Author Information

Nathaniel Jezzi
Email: n.jezzi@abdn.ac.uk
University of Aberdeen
United Kingdom

Epistemology of Memory

We learn a lot. Friends tell us about their lives. Books tell us about the past. We see the world. We reason and we reflect on our mental lives. As a result we come to know and to form justified beliefs about a range of topics. We also seem to keep these beliefs. How? The natural answer is: by memory. It is not too hard to understand that memory allows us to retain information. It is harder to understand exactly how memory allows us to retain knowledge and reasons for our beliefs. Learning is largely a matter of acquiring reasons for changing views. But how do we keep reasons for the views we keep? The epistemology of memory concerns memory’s role in our having knowledge and justification. This branch of epistemology, unlike nearly all other branches, addresses our having knowledge and justification over time.

This article reviews the major epistemic roles that philosophers have assigned to memory. Section 1 surveys the nature of memory and the various memory systems. Some philosophers think the relation knowledge bears to at least one memory system is maximally strong: remembering just is a way of knowing. Section 2 covers this strong relation. Section 3 canvases the main problems that data on human memory pose to theories of justification and the central attempts to solve these problems. Section 4 discusses the historical and contemporary responses to two main skeptical challenges about memory.

The Nature of Memory
Memory and Knowledge
1. The Epistemic Theory of Memory
Memory and Justification
1. Problems
2. Responses
Memory and Skepticism
1. Memory and Accuracy
2. Memory and the Past
References and Further Reading

1. The Nature of Memory

Traditionally, philosophers have likened memory to a storehouse or a recording device. In the Theaetetus, Plato claims that the mind is analogous to a wax tablet. To perceive is to make an impression on the tablet, leaving behind an exact image or representation of what was perceived. Memory keeps the images and forgetting is a matter of losing them. In his Confessions, Augustine says perception deposits images of objects into the storehouse of memory and the process of recalling is the process of retrieving these deposits. Locke and Hume tell much the same story, as do many other philosophers up through the 20^th century.

On this storehouse view, memory stockpiles experiences and beliefs. Stored items may eventually degrade or become hard to access, but otherwise do not change (see Audi (1994: 420-1), Burge (1997: 321) and McGrath (2007: 13)). This view is commonsensical. It explains how it is that we are able to represent the past accurately in our thoughts and recollective experiences. It also explains why each of us, over time, tends to believe the same thing occurrently more than once. Yesterday, Maria believed that she went to high school in Santa Fe and she believes that today too.

During the 20^th century psychologists generally abandoned the storehouse view (see for example Bartlett (1932) and Schacter (1996, 2002)), though still thinking that memory stores information. They believe human memory processing is much more complicated than the mere depositing of items and later withdrawing them. Memory selectively stores information, expands part of it, combines it with background information and adds data from the context, in which the subject later retrieves the information. In other words, memory generally alters significantly what enters it. As a result, recollecting is not the retrieving, but rather the generating of representations of the past. Recollecting actually generates new beliefs about the past. Empirically minded philosophers of memory also have generally abandoned the storehouse view in favor of this generative view (see, for example, Debus (2010) and Michaelian (2011a, 2011b)), but epistemologists have been slower to shift models. Since this article covers the epistemological discussion of memory up to the beginning of the 21^st century, the storehouse view will generally be implicit.

Setting aside how exactly memory works, it will aid our epistemological discussion to get clearer on what memory is of or for. At least as far back as Henri Bergson (1896/1994) and Bertrand Russell (1921/1995), philosophers have recognized that there are different kinds of memory, or different memory systems and 20^th century psychological research has confirmed the philosophers’ distinctions. Talk of ‘memory’ simpliciter, as if there were a single, uniform faculty, can obscure it. Distinct memory systems allow us to do different things and consist of different networks of rule-governed psychological processes. Two memory systems that are important to distinguish are declarative memory and procedural memory. Declarative memory is memory of information and events. Procedural memory is memory for skills and of how to perform actions. Different parts of the brain house, on the one hand, our data about bicycle riding and our riding experiences and, on the other hand, our acquired talent for riding. This helps explain the familiar phenomenon of finding it easy to do something, yet hard to state instructions for doing it (think of swimming, playing a flute, or tying a shoe), or vice versa.

Declarative memory divides into semantic (or propositional) memory and episodic (or experiential) memory. Semantic memory is memory for propositions and episodic memory is memory for events, one has experienced. To see this distinction, consider how these types of memory can come apart. You remember that Plato taught Aristotle, but you do not remember Plato teaching Aristotle. How could you remember it? You were neither there nor did you witness it. I can remember that I was born in a hospital, but (mercifully) I cannot remember being born in a hospital.

Semantic memory underlies memories with propositional content; semantic memory claims are often of the form “S remembers that p”. Episodic memory underlies memories with a kind of non-propositional content; episodic memory claims are often of the form “S remembers x”. Semantic memory is by far the most discussed memory system in epistemology. This is understandable, since epistemology centers on states that have propositional content. Epistemologists primarily discuss what it is for S to know that p, or what it is for S to have justification for believing that p, or the like. They focus less on non-propositional knowledge and justification. The epistemology of memory, as a result, has chiefly been the epistemology of semantic memory.

But it is worth noting that neglecting to consider other memory systems can render our epistemological theories vulnerable. Some philosophers have objected to certain theories of propositional knowledge on the grounds that they do not accommodate the role that episodic memory plays in our believing (see, for example, Shanton (2011)). And deeper reflection on procedural memory may advance other debates in epistemology, such as debates concerning knowledge-how. Knowledge-how is a practical knowledge, what you have when you know how to swim or how to tie a shoe. There is debate about whether knowledge-how is reducible to knowledge-that. That is, there is debate about whether practical knowledge can be fully understood in terms of knowing various propositions. But procedural memory seems to ground our knowledge-how and it differs importantly from declarative memory (see Michaelian (2011a)). In fact, psychological research suggests that sophisticated procedural memory can be retained even when semantic memory is crippled (one artist entirely lost his knowledge of language due to brain-damage, having to relearn his native tongue altogether and yet he remembered how to paint! See Schacter (1996: 140-2)). Investigating procedural memory may help reveal that knowledge-how is not reducible to knowledge-that.

2. Memory and Knowledge

Most of the interesting features of memory’s relationship with knowledge originate in memory’s relationship with justification. Knowledge requires justification. As a result, when justification connects in interesting ways with a topic, knowledge shares those connections. This section covers what is perhaps the only unique connection between memory and knowledge.

a. The Epistemic Theory of Memory

Semantic memory is responsible for our remembering that something is true. Much philosophizing in the 20^th century tried to state necessary and sufficient conditions for propositions of the form S remembers that p. The theory that dominated that discussion is especially important in epistemology: the epistemic theory of memory (see, for example, Anscombe (1981), Ayer (1956), Audi (2002), Locke (1971), Malcolm (1963), Moon (2013), Owens (2000), Pappas (1980) and Williamson (2000)). Roughly put, the epistemic theory states that remembering is a kind of knowing. If S remembers that p, then S knows that p. Many philosophers go even further: if S remembers that p, then S knows that p because S previously knew that p. You remember that Plato taught Aristotle, and this is because in the past you came to know that Plato taught Aristotle, and because that past knowledge has contributed to your present knowledge. (Incidentally, Plato might even agree; he appears to endorse the epistemic theory of memory in the Theaetetus.)

If the epistemic theory of memory is correct, we might not remember as much as we think we do. Remembering requires knowing and the standards for knowing are not low. In particular, it is generally accepted among philosophers that S knows that p just in case p is true, S believes that p, believing that p is justified for S and it is not accidental that S’s justification for p gives S a true belief that p. Knowledge is a kind of justified true belief, a kind where the truth of the belief is tightly connected to its justification. When the connection is not tight, the belief might be “Gettiered” or true by sheer accident. If you see someone walking down the street dressed as a postal worker, you might justifiedly believe that your mail will be delivered soon. Suppose the person you see is not in fact a postal worker, but is merely testing out a Halloween costume. And suppose that, nonetheless, the mail will indeed be delivered soon; your regular postal worker is just around the corner, delivering mail to your neighbor. Your belief that the mail will be delivered soon is justified, but true only by coincidence. So you do not know that the mail will be delivered soon.

If remembering requires knowing, then remembering requires everything required for knowing. If any requirement is not met, one does not remember, but at best merely seems to remember. In other words, if you seem to remember that the keys are on the dresser, but they in fact are not there, or you have no reason to believe that they are there, or you simply deny that they are there, then you do not remember that they are there.

Why endorse the epistemic theory of memory? A main reason is that it fits our ordinary uses of “remembers” and “knows” (see Moon (2013)). Consider the following conjunctive claim: Sally remembers that she has visited Rhode Island, but she does not know that she has. This conjunction sounds odd and one plausible explanation of the oddness is that remembering requires knowing. The second conjunct denies something the first conjunct asserts, so the conjunction seems incoherent.

Here is a closely related reason for endorsing the epistemic theory. Remembering requires knowing just in case all of the following are true: remembering requires believing, remembering requires justification and remembering requires non-accidental truth. And we can argue, one at a time, that remembering does indeed have these requirements. For example, the best explanation of the oddness of certain conjunctive claims is that remembering requires believing. Consider: Peter remembers that he owes Paul a dollar, but he does not believe that he owes Paul a dollar. At least at first glance, it is hard to make sense of this. How could Peter remember that without believing it?

Andrew Moon (2013) proposes another reason for supposing that remembering requires believing. He claims that if S remembers that p, then S can use p as a premise in certain justifying inferences. But, Moon adds, a premise is usable in justifying inference only if believed. If you do not believe that all tigers are mammals and that all mammals are animals, you cannot use these propositions as premises for reasonably inferring that all tigers are animals. So, remembering requires believing. Similarly, Moon claims that remembering requires justifiedly believing. This is because a premise is usable in justifying inference only if justifiedly believed. And inferences based on remembered propositions are justifying. So, remembering requires justified belief.

However, Moon’s argument faces worries. Suppose S remembers that p, but also remembers that all experts deny that p. Can S use p as a premise in any justifying inferences? Perhaps not. If S cannot, then not all we remember is usable as a justifying premise and Moon has not shown remembering requires believing. Or, suppose S justifiedly does not believe p. Couldn’t S nonetheless have reason to believe that if she uses p (rather than not-p) in her inferences, she will be more likely to arrive at the truth (if, say, p is a scientific theory that is likely ‘false but approximately true’)? If so, S might be able to use p as a premise in justifying inference, without believing p. Even if remembering that p allows justified inference from p, justified inference from p would not guarantee belief that p. It would not follow that remembering requires believing.

While the epistemic theory may make sense of certain conjunctive claims, it faces many objections. As noted above, if remembering requires knowing, then remembering requires everything required for knowing: belief, justification and non-accidental truth. Arguments against the epistemic theory have tried to show that remembering is possible even when at least one of these three requirements for knowledge is not met.

Martin and Deutscher (1966) give a well-known example, in which there (allegedly) is remembering without believing. A painter paints a detailed farmyard scene. He believes he merely imagined the scene. However, it turns out that the painting captures an actual farmyard scene that the painter saw as a child. Unwittingly, the painter simply reproduced that scene. Martin and Deutscher (1966) add that the painter “did his work by no mere accident,” suggesting that the painter’s childhood experience caused him to bring to mind the scene (even though he believes that he merely imagined the scene). They conclude that this is a case of remembering without belief. Since knowing requires believing, this would be a case of remembering without knowing.

Martin and Deutscher’s conclusion may in a sense be right, yet their example may also not pose any problem for the epistemic theory. We can agree that the painter does not believe that the scene occurred. But exactly what is it the painter is remembering? It is plausible that, if he is indeed remembering something, he is remembering the scene or his visual experience of it. It is less plausible that he is remembering that the scene occurred or remembering the scene as having occurred. In other words, Martin and Deutscher may have given a case of remembering without believing, but the remembering is not semantic. It is episodic or some other sort of memory. If that is correct, then the example is no threat to the epistemic theory of memory, since that theory concerns only semantic memory.

Audi (1995) and Bernecker (2010: 75-7) appear to offer cases of remembering without the sort of justification that knowledge requires. Knowledge requires fairly strong justification and this justification must not be defeated. If Billy knows that there is a cookie on the table, then Billy has strong reason to believe that it is on the table. Even if he has some reason to doubt that there is a cookie on the table (he may have reason to suspect that his sister shaped some clay to look like a cookie), these doubts do not defeat his justification, when he knows that there is a cookie on the table.

Audi and Bernecker offer the following kind of case. Suppose you remember that Plato taught Aristotle. However, your friends go on to play a prank on you and give you convincing reasons to think Plato never taught Aristotle–Plato never existed and Aristotle had no teacher. You retain your belief, but the prank defeats your justification. Your justification is no longer strong enough for you to know that Plato taught Aristotle. Nonetheless, Audi and Bernecker would think, you remember that Plato taught Aristotle. So, they conclude, remembering does not require justification.

But why suppose that, after the prank, you still remember that Plato taught Aristotle? The answer is unclear. Is it because you still have a true belief, which you acquired in the past, even though you lack overall reason for keeping it? Why would that be sufficient for remembering? Unless an explanation is offered, we may not have reason to count the case as a counterexample to the epistemic theory of memory.

Bernecker (2010) describes a case, in which there appears to be remembering without non-accidental truth–that is, the remembered proposition is true by mere accident: you justifiably, but incorrectly believe that your friend has borrowed a certain book from the library. Later, your friend indeed checks out that very book. As a result, your belief is true, but by coincidence alone. Bernecker thinks you still count as remembering that your friend has borrowed the book from the library. If this is a case of remembering an accidentally true proposition, it is a case of remembering without knowing. But is the antecedent here true? Some philosophers (for instance Moon (2013),) see no reason to suppose that it is. If Bernecker can persuade us that it is in fact true, he will have provided a genuine counterexample to the epistemic theory of memory.

We have seen several attempts to show that remembering does not require knowing. Each attempt faces a similar problem: when knowledge is absent, it is unclear whether semantic remembering is present. Support for the claim that semantic remembering is indeed present has typically involved an appeal to intuitions that some critics apparently lack. But there may be a less controversial way of showing that remembering does not entail knowing. If epistemologists discard the storehouse view of memory and adopt the generative view, they may discover clearer kinds of cases, where propositions are remembered, yet not known, or at least not known in the past by the subject.

For debates about the epistemic theory of memory, it matters significantly whether remembering entails knowing. And it matters significantly for another debate in epistemology. Timothy Williamson (2000) has influentially argued that the concept of knowledge is fundamental in our thinking. Having the concept of knowledge crucially allows us to understand quite a bit of psychology and epistemology and we cannot fully explain knowledge in terms of other psychological or epistemological conditions and relations.

In support of this, Williamson (2000: 34) claims that “knowing is the most general factive stative attitude.” He means roughly that, if the state of having a certain kind of attitude toward p (like hearing that p or seeing that p) guarantees that p is true then being in that state guarantees that p is known. Knowing is the most general factive stative attitude, in that there is no way that S could be in the state of having a truth-guaranteeing attitude toward p without also knowing that p. Now, many philosophers think that remembering that p guarantees that p is true, even if remembering that p does not guarantee belief that p, strong overall justification for believing that p or the non-accidental truth of p. If they are right and remembering does not require knowing, then Williamson’s claim is incorrect. Remembering is factive, but is not knowledge, so knowledge is not the most general factive stative attitude. As a result, his argument would weaken; it is less clear that the concept of knowledge is fundamental to our thinking.

A closely related claim of Williamson’s may also be challenged, if remembering does not require knowing. Williamson says that all and only evidence is knowledge. More precisely, he says that S knows that p just in case p is included in S’s total evidence. It is plausible that if S remembers that p, then S’s total evidence includes p. If this is right and if remembering does not require knowing, then not all evidence is knowledge. Some of what we remember is evidence, yet not known.

3. Memory and Justification

For most debates in the epistemology of memory it does not matter whether remembering entails knowing. This is because most debates ultimately concern the connections between memory and epistemic justification. So, even if remembering does not entail knowing, there remains much to discuss. One neutral way of proceeding is to think about cases of apparent remembering: cases, in which a subject has a memory experience that p, or recollects that p, or recalls p as known or as true and so on. Even if the subject is not in fact remembering that p, memory may still justify the subject in believing that p. But how? And in exactly what circumstances?

a. Problems

In debates about epistemic justification, philosophers have construed memory mainly as a source of challenges. A main way to test a theory of justification is to see if it has the right implication in cases, where memory plays some special role. Philosophers apply this test most frequently in the debate about internalism and externalism in Epistemology.

It is controversial what these views even are, but here is a rough characterization. At a minimum, internalism states that mentally alike individuals are completely alike in their justification (see Conee and Feldman (2001)). Environmental differences by themselves make no difference to justification. So if, for example, you are justified in believing that there are boxes in the basement, that justification would remain even if your neighbor stole all the boxes from the basement. In order for your justification to change, your mental life would have to change–you would need to have a visual experience of an empty basement, or to seem to hear your spouse report that the basement is bare and so forth. You, and someone mentally just like you, are both justified in believing that there are boxes in the basement, even if only one of you has boxes, even if only one of you lives in a world with basements.

Externalism is the denial of internalism. It states that environmental differences can result in differences in justification, even if they do not result in mental differences. What is actually downstairs may matter. Or it may matter what is downstairs in nearby possible worlds. It may matter whether the particular way, in which you would form or keep the belief that there are boxes in the basement, tends to get at the truth.

Any theory of justification appears to face some challenge from facts about human memory. Externalists have argued that their view can overcome these challenges better than internalism can (see, for example, Bernecker (2008, 2010), Goldman (1999, 2009, 2011), Greco (2005) and Senor (1993, 2010)). A fine way to test a theory of justification is to check its implications about particular cases. A complete theory of justification will have implications about every particular case. The implications of a good theory of justification will also match our intuitive judgments about each case. The implications of a bad theory will not. That is, a good theory will typically imply that ordinary people, in ordinary circumstances are justified in believing what clearly trustworthy people tell them, in believing what their senses tell them about the world, in believing what seems to them to be the best explanation of what they have to go on and so on. A bad theory will not have all these implications and will imply that in some of these circumstances believing what is commonsensical is unjustified.

The circumstances of concern in this article all involve memory. The next sections cover particular kinds of circumstances that help test the implications of theories of justification. Think of each kind of circumstance as introducing a problem for these theories. If externalists are correct, and their view indeed has an easier time accommodating our intuitions and thereby solving these problems, then internalism is in bad shape. If, however, internalism can solve these problems easily enough, then it is much better off than many externalists suppose.

After introducing the problems we will consider the main responses to them. Of course, these are neither the only problems memory poses to theories of justification, nor the only responses. They are just the ones that have received the most attention.

i. The Problem of Forgotten Evidence

We are forgetful. We forget email passwords, where we put the car keys, anniversaries, acquaintances’ names and more. In some cases this gets us into trouble and in other cases it is harmless. Interestingly, when we do not forget and we keep beliefs about these things, we often nonetheless forget our original evidence for our beliefs. I cannot recall how I learned that Fred’s name is “Fred”–did a trustworthy friend tell me? Did Fred himself tell me? And you know that your email password is “iluvphilosophy,” but you cannot remember choosing it all those years ago. That password just seems familiar and using it works.

Forgetting is an epistemologically significant phenomenon. Here is one reason for that. In many cases, it seems that when we keep a belief, yet forget our original evidence for it, the belief remains justified. But this appears to conflict with certain theories of justification. In particular, it apparently conflicts with evidentialism, the view that the justified attitude for a subject toward a proposition is the attitude that fits the subject’s evidence (see Conee and Feldman (2008, 2011), Feldman and Conee (1985) and McCain (2014)). Understood broadly, your evidence is what you have to go on–your experiences, thoughts, feelings, background information and so forth. Evidentialism implies that if you are justified in believing that Fred’s name is “Fred”, then believing that fits what you have to go on. If you lose crucial evidence, however, believing that Fred’s name is “Fred” may no longer fit your evidence.

The Problem of Forgotten Evidence is the problem of accommodating our intuitions about justification, in cases where key-supporting evidence has been forgotten. There seem to be a lot of cases of this sort; we regularly forget our original evidence, while retaining the belief. Gilbert Harman (1986) is typically credited with developing this problem, though he never called it the “Problem of Forgotten Evidence”.

Which theories face the Problem of Forgotten Evidence? As mentioned above, evidentialism faces it. Traditionally, evidentialism has been understood to be a form of internalism. As a result, philosophers have understood the Problem of Forgotten Evidence to be a problem only for internalist theories of justification (for instance, Bernecker (2008, 2010)). But there are some evidentialist forms of externalism (see Comesaña (2010) and Goldman (2011)). These theories do not quite understand evidence to be all that you have to go on. Rather, evidence is understood more narrowly: it is just the stuff you have to go on, such that beliefs formed on its basis tend to be true (where contingent environmental factors partly determine what tends to be true).

So, some forms of externalism face the problem; evidence, even on the narrower understanding, can be forgotten. The problem also challenges any theory of justification that states that S’s having evidence for p is necessary for S’s being justified in believing that p. Some non-evidentialist externalist theories state roughly this necessary condition (see Alston (1988)). And finally, while the Problem of Forgotten Evidence is stated in terms of forgetting evidence, there is a more general problem here: how do we accommodate our intuitions about justification in cases, where whatever it is that originally conferred justification (be it evidence or something else) is forgotten? It could be that most theories of justification face this more general problem, which is discussed prior to Harman (1986) by George Pappas (1980).

Any theory that faces, but cannot solve, the Problem of Forgotten Evidence is doubtful. It is important to consider, then, possible solutions to the problem and to consider which theories have solutions available. Before considering these matters, two related problems about memory and justification should be mentioned.

ii. The Problem of Forgotten Defeat

Unfortunately, we forget more than just our original reasons for believing. We also forget our defeaters, that is, our reasons for not believing, or for doubting our reasons for believing. Sometimes we remember our original reasons, yet forget our defeaters. You remember your original reason for believing that there are boxes in the basement: this morning you saw what looked to you like boxes, in what looked to you like the basement. But suppose your spouse tells you that the children have since taken all of the boxes out of the basement, in order to build a fort outside. Or, your spouse tells you that you did not in fact see boxes in the basement–you saw them in the attic. If you forget what your spouse told you, yet you retain your belief that there are boxes in the basement, you have forgotten a defeater for your belief. On some theories of justification, your belief can still count as justified.

Another kind of forgotten defeat is this. Suppose you never had any reason to believe that there are boxes in the basement, but you believed it anyways. Some theories will count this belief as justified, once you forget that you never had any reason for it. Some philosophers find this result unacceptable (see Annis (1980), Goldman (1999, 2009), Greco (2005) and Huemer (1999)). The Problem of Forgotten Defeat is the problem of accommodating our intuitions about justification in cases where key-defeating evidence has been forgotten.

Far more theories face the Problem of Forgotten Defeat than face the Problem of Forgotten Evidence and that is one of the reasons why it is worth distinguishing these problems. Often these problems are conflated–in fact, the former problem has never been given a name before. The reason that many more theories face the Problem of Forgotten Defeat is this. Just about every theory of justification–even theories that deny that some evidence can play a justifying role–grants that some evidence, understood broadly, can play a defeating role. That is, nearly all theories agree that, even if having evidence cannot by itself justify, having evidence can by itself eliminate justification. Your visual experience of the cookie on the table is part of your evidence that there is a cookie on the table. Non-evidentialists will deny that your evidence on its own justifies believing that there is a cookie on the table. But typically they would grant that your evidence at least partially defeats any justification you had for believing that there is nothing on the table. So, cases of forgotten defeat challenge both evidentialist and non-evidentialist theories, although philosophers (for example, Annis (1980), Goldman (2001, 2009), Greco (2005) and Huemer (1999)) have presented the problem as though only internalist and evidentialist theories face it.

iii. The Problem of Stored Beliefs

The final problem centers on beliefs that are merely stored. (Some philosophers instead call these beliefs non-occurrent or standing or dispositional.) These are beliefs that are in no way before the subject’s mind. The believer is not thinking about, reasoning from, acting from, or having an experience concerning them or their content. Contrast these with occurrent beliefs, which are before the subject’s mind. When you are remembering that Plato taught Aristotle, or are telling others about it, your belief that Plato taught Aristotle is occurrent. At most other times–when you are sleeping, driving, playing chess, washing dishes–that belief is merely stored in memory. (This seems true on the storehouse model of memory, at least; on a generative model you may lack the belief of these other times).

A belief can be both occurrent and stored, just as a song can be both playing and stored on your computer. A merely stored song is stored but not playing. Similarly, a merely stored belief is stored, but not occurrent. It is commonsensical to attribute countless stored beliefs to people, who are in normal circumstances. A few moments ago, you had beliefs about chemistry, the first U.S. President, your childhood, panda bears, the Indian Ocean, the Super Bowl and countless other topics. A few moments ago almost all of these beliefs were not just stored, but were merely stored. And it is plausible that many of these beliefs were justified a few moments ago. The Problem of Stored Beliefs is the problem of explaining how the merely stored beliefs that seem justified are indeed justified (for simplicity, the discussion below for the most part omits the ‘merely’).

Thomas Senor (1993) and Alvin Goldman (1999) influentially pose this as a special problem for internalism about epistemic justification (though George Pappas (1980) briefly discusses the more general problem even earlier). Goldman (2011) and Matthew McGrath (2007) target internalist evidentialism in particular. Our occurrent experiences, thoughts and feelings might justify some of our stored beliefs, but not nearly enough. Our active mental lives, at any given time, simply do not bear on most of our stored beliefs. As a result, internalism appears unable to explain how all justified stored beliefs are justified. The same goes for evidentialism, since our evidence is too constrained to fit all our justified stored beliefs.

Andrew Moon (2012) directs a knowledge-version of the Problem of Stored Beliefs toward an evidentialist view concerning knowledge. The evidentialist view is that S knows that p at t only if S believes that p on the basis of evidence at t. We have stored beliefs while we sleep and we know many of these believed propositions. But while we sleep, these beliefs have no evidential basis, so knowledge does not require an evidential basis. Though Moon’s argument concerns just knowledge, we can offer a parallel argument that concerns justified belief. If his original argument is sound, then the parallel argument is too and so justified belief does not require an evidential basis.

Of course, externalist and non-evidentialist theories also face the Problem of Stored Beliefs. But these theories can avail themselves of non-mental, non-evidential resources, so they appear to have an easier time solving the problem. The next section reviews some of these resources.

It is important to distinguish the Problem of Stored Beliefs and the Problem of Forgotten Evidence. The phenomenon of forgetting is essential to the latter problem, but not to the former. We can store in memory our original evidence for a justified, merely stored belief. So there is no relevant forgotten evidence here, but some questions remain: what evidence could justify the belief? Is it the evidence that is stored in memory? How could it justify when it is not accessed? And the phenomenon of having stored beliefs is not essential to the Problem of Forgotten Evidence, but it is obviously essential to the Problem of Stored Beliefs. We can forget the original evidence for a belief that remains occurrent: if I am distracted and exhausted when we meet at a bustling party and you tell me that you are from Santa Fe, I might form the belief that you are from Santa Fe, but immediately forget that you just told me so. I might even be slightly puzzled as to why I find myself believing that you are from Santa Fe. My belief was justified when formed, but what justifies it a moment later, when I have forgotten my evidence?

It is clear, then, that the Problem of Stored Beliefs and the Problem of Forgotten Evidence are dissociable. Consequently it is a mistake to assume that they must share a solution. And it is possibly misleading to introduce the two problems simultaneously with a single example, as some philosophers do, without distinguishing them (see Goldman (2011), for instance). Doing so invites conflation of the problems.

b. Responses

The three problems discussed above are challenging. Tackling them has, however, helped inspire novel epistemological theses and observations about memory, some of which are general and may solve multiple problems, while others are more piecemeal and particular. This section looks first at the more characteristically evidentialist or internalist responses to the Problem of Forgotten Evidence and the Problem of Stored Beliefs and then at the more ecumenical responses. Replies to the Problem of Forgotten Defeat follow.

In answer to the Problem of Forgotten Evidence, Earl Conee and Richard Feldman (2001) point out that in ordinary cases, even when all of S’s original evidence for p is lost, S still has a host of evidence that could justify her in believing that p. This evidence could for example be rooted in induction, background information about memory or conscious recollection. You have forgotten why you originally believed that Fred’s name is “Fred”. But you have reason to believe that you tend to form beliefs with good reason, so you have evidence that you originally had good reason for your belief and this supports the belief. And you have reason to believe that your memory is fairly accurate. Since memory is supplying your belief about Fred’s name, you have justifying evidence for it. And if you are consciously recollecting that Fred’s name is “Fred”, then your experience is displaying that proposition as true, just as perceptual experiences display propositions about the external world as true. So, evidentialists of any stripe (internalist or externalist) can claim that there generally is justifying evidence in the central cases that motivate the Problem of Forgotten Evidence.

However, we do not usually have all of this evidence for a belief that is merely stored. A merely stored belief, by stipulation, is not being consciously recollected. Hence, the Problem of Stored Beliefs remains. Feldman (1988) and Conee and Feldman (2001) propose that justified stored beliefs can have “stored justifications”; S can recall some justifying evidence for p, when S has a justified stored belief that p. S’s evidence for p is stored (compare McCain (2014)). On this view, justified stored beliefs typically are not justified in the most fundamental sense, in the sense that justified occurrent beliefs typically are. When justified in the most fundamental sense, not all of the justifiers are stored, but rather some justifiers are occurrent: experiences, inferences and so on. If it is plausible that justified stored beliefs have the most fundamental kind of justification, then Conee and Feldman’s proposal will not solve the Problem of Stored Beliefs.

On a closely related proposal, the evidence and justifiers are occurrent. Call the proposal dispositionalism: dispositions of the right sort can justify (see Audi (1995), Conee and Feldman (2011), and Ginet (1975)). These dispositions can be memorial. Maria is disposed to recollect that she went to high school in Santa Fe. With the right cue, in ordinary circumstances, she will recollect that fact about her past. On dispositionalism, this disposition justifies her in believing that she went to high school in Santa Fe. The disposition is only occasionally manifest–she only occasionally thinks about where she went to high school–but she nonetheless has the disposition right now; it is not simply stored. As a result, the disposition can epistemically justify in the most fundamental sense right now. In some ways, dispositionalism parallels virtue ethics, which claims among other things that a virtue is a disposition that morally justifies certain actions, even when the disposition is not manifest.

Dispositionalism offers a promising solution to the Problem of Stored Beliefs. It also could solve the Problem of Forgotten Evidence: typically in cases, where S has forgotten her original evidence for her justified belief that p, S still has a disposition to recall p as known or as true. If this disposition justifies believing that p for her, then the Problem of Forgotten Evidence may disappear.

However, dispositionalism still needs crucial development. More must be said about exactly which dispositions justify believing exactly which propositions and how; and it would be good to have a principled way of determining which dispositions a given subject has, in order to see whether dispositionalism attributes to the subject justification for believing just the right propositions.

Conee and Feldman (2001) offer starting material for a final internalist, evidentialist-friendly solution to the Problem of Stored Beliefs. If we have stored beliefs, then these beliefs can justify other beliefs, including other stored beliefs. We can direct this proposal at the Problem of Forgotten Evidence too: stored beliefs can justify a belief, for which all original evidence has been forgotten.

A worry for this proposal is that we may not have enough stored beliefs to solve the two problems. We may not, in other words, have enough stored beliefs that could justify all justified stored beliefs and all beliefs that lack their original evidence. Goldman (2009) voices another worry: what ultimately justifies any stored belief? If a belief that p is justified by a stored belief that q, the latter belief should be justified too. It is hard to see how an unjustified belief can by itself justify another. But what justifies the belief that q? Does a stored belief that r justify it? If so, what justifies this stored belief that r? And so on.

A moderate form of coherentism could address Goldman’s worry: if S’s belief that p coheres with certain of S’s other beliefs, then S’s belief that p is justified. Coherence among stored beliefs can justify them. And coherence can justify belief in the face of forgotten evidence. Beliefs can have a special, mutually supporting relationship. However, coherentism has its costs; see Coherentism. But perhaps it could, if suitably defended, substantiate Conee and Feldman’s proposal. Still, if any stored belief is justifiedly based on something other than beliefs, then coherentism, even if correct, does not fully solve the Problem of Stored Beliefs (compare Moon 2012: 316-7).

The remaining responses to the problems are also available to externalists and non-evidentialists. A view nearly universally endorsed by discussants of the problems is what we might call preservationism (see Annis (1980), Bernecker (2008), Burge (1997), Goldman (2009, 2011) Naylor (2012), Owens (2000), Pappas (1980) and Senor (2010); some philosophers use ‘preservationism’ to refer to the view called ‘anti-generativism’ below). Roughly put, memory preserves the justification of the beliefs it preserves. More precisely, if S is justified in believing that p at t₁, and retains in memory a belief that p until t₂, then at t₂ S’s belief that p is prima facie justified. (The ‘prima facie’ here allows that the belief may not be justified overall if there are defeaters for it.) Your belief that Plato taught Aristotle was justified when you formed it: a professor or some other clearly credible source told you that Plato taught Aristotle. And you have kept that belief ever since. So, your belief has ever since been justified.

Preservationism seems to provide a simple solution to the Problem of Stored Beliefs. Regardless of whether a belief is stored rather than occurrent, it can retain its justification as long as memory preserves it. A stored belief can inherit justification from the past and this appears to solve the problem. And forgetting evidence does not block the inheritance. So, preservationism appears to solve the Problem of Forgotten Evidence. In fact, a main motivation for preservationism is that it seems to solve these problems at no cost.

But is preservationism true? Externalists think that it is true only if certain features that are external to the mind obtain. Process reliabilists, for example, think that preservationism is true just in case memory is reliable. Process reliabilism is roughly the view that justification of a belief depends entirely on the reliability of the process that forms or retains the belief. According to preservationism, beliefs retain justification by being retained in memory. As a result, reliabilists think memory must be reliable, in order for preservationism to be true. Since it is contingent whether memory is reliable, on reliabilism it is contingent whether preservationism is true. Reliabilists, who appeal to preservationism, in order to solve the Problem of Stored Beliefs and Problem of Forgotten Evidence, bear the burden of showing that memory is reliable.

And, if the storehouse view of memory is indeed incorrect, then preservationism appears vacuous unless modified. If memory typically alters the information entering it, it is hard to see how memory could preserve many beliefs over time–the beliefs would seem to be destroyed, once their exact content is no longer represented in memory. Preservationists, who reject the storehouse view, must explain either of two things: first, how memory can nonetheless tend to preserve beliefs, even though it tends to modify the content that enters it; or second, how something other than memory preserves beliefs. Pursuing either option may require developing a novel theory of belief.

Now for replies to the Problem of Forgotten Defeat: Richard Feldman (2005) and Matthew McGrath (2007) in a sense deny that this problem exists. When a defeater is forgotten, it is no longer relevant to what one is justified in believing. Once you forget that your spouse told you that the children removed all of the boxes from the basement, your spouse’s testimony ceases to defeat; you are overall justified in believing that there are boxes in the basement, as long as you still have some support for believing that.

Feldman and McGrath press their point: some attitude toward the proposition that there are boxes in the basement must be justified for you. But which? Abandoning belief in the proposition seems unjustified, since you no longer have reason to abandon your belief. And suspending judgment in the proposition seems unjustified, since you still have some justifying support for believing it–for example, a vivid recollection of what looked like boxes in what looked like the basement. The only potentially justified attitude remaining for you is belief. It is hard to see a competing option. If that is correct, then forgetting defeaters poses no problem. Nothing, which is forgotten, can defeat. (Of course, something other than the original defeater can still defeat. If for example you recall that you have forgotten a defeater for p, but cannot recall what it was, then arguably you still have a defeater for p: you have reason to believe that you had reason to doubt p. Having reason to believe this is itself reason to doubt p.)

Why, then, suppose that there even is a Problem of Forgotten Defeat? Why suppose that forgotten defeaters remain at all relevant to justification? The main reason is this: many philosophers think that memory, unlike perception, testimony, rational intuition and reasoning, is not a generative source of justification. Memory cannot create or strengthen justification. Rather, memory at most preserves justification that has been acquired from some source (such as perception, testimony and so on). Call this thesis about memory anti-generativism. It is a “garbage in, garbage out” view of justification and memory. An unjustified belief that enters memory remains unjustified, unless new reasons for the belief are acquired from some faculty other than memory. Anti-generativism is traditional and popular (see Annis (1980), Goldman (2009, 2011), Owens (2000) and Senor (2007)), and so are variants of the view that concern knowledge or warrant (see Audi (1997), Burge (1997), Dummett (1994) and Plantinga (1993)). With respect to knowledge, many philosophers think memory and testimony are alike in this way: coming to know that p via testimony requires that the testifier knows that p; testimony does not generate knowledge from non-knowledge.

Sometimes anti-generativism is called “preservationism”, but this is infelicitous. Anti-generativism primarily states a limit on memory: memory does not generate justification, or knowledge, or anything similar. The theory does not centrally concern memory’s power to preserve anything (unlike the theory that is called “preservationism” above, which does centrally concern memory’s preservative power).

If anti-generativism is plausible, then the theories of justification that are compatible with it may avoid the Problem of Forgotten Defeat and theories that are incompatible with it may on that account face the Problem of Forgotten Defeat.

However, generativism, the view that memory can generate justification, is increasingly common (see Audi (2002), Bernecker (2010), Lackey (2005, 2007), Huemer (1999), Michaelian (2011a) and Owens (1996)). Arguments for this view reveal that it comes in several forms. Jennifer Lackey (2005, 2007) and Sven Bernecker (2010) join ranks with Feldman and McGrath in thinking that memory generates justification in cases of forgotten defeat. But notice that the justification generated in these cases is overall, not prima facie. That is, since memory is responsible for the loss of a defeater, memory results in a balance of justification that favors belief. This is not yet to say that memory is creating new reasons for belief. One generativist view, then, is that memory can generate overall justification, even if it cannot generate prima facie justification.

Lackey offers other support for generativism: a subject’s memory can store information, which, in the past, the subject never paid attention to. If the subject recalls and attends to the information afterward, the subject can use it to form justified belief. The basis of this belief would be memory. Lackey builds her support with an example. Suppose that Clifford has his mind on many things, while he is driving. Later, his friend Phoebe asks him whether construction on the freeway has begun. Clifford then recalls seeing construction on his recent drive and only then forms a belief that construction on the freeway has begun. His belief is justified and memory is its source. Generativism follows. Still, as Bernecker (2010) observes, if Lackey is correct, she has only supported the generativist view that memory can generate doxastic justification. She has not shown that memory can generate propositional justification. In other words, at best Lackey demonstrates that memory can generate a reasonable belief, not that memory can generate new reasons for believing. Memory merely based a belief on a reason that perception generated.

Huemer (1999) and Michaelian (2011a) endorse the stronger thesis that memory can generate new reasons for believing. Huemer thinks that S’s seeming to remember that p can produce reason for S to form a belief that p, regardless of whether S already had reason to believe that p. And Michaelian attacks the storehouse view of memory, arguing that memory can generate new content and new belief in that content. The belief can have justification when formed as long as certain external conditions are in place (and Michaelian thinks they are). Consequently, sometimes, when memory generates justified belief, it generates justification for believing.

Since anti-generativism is controversial, the severity of the Problem of Forgotten Defeat is unclear. Interestingly, although it is primarily externalists who find the problem to be severe, the mix of internalist and externalist advocates of generativism is fairly even.

4. Memory and Skepticism

So far the surveyed discussion has assumed that memory plays some role in our actually having justification and knowledge, and the discussants have simply debated the margins of that role. But many early and mid-20^th century epistemologists worried about this assumption. Why believe memory has an important, or even any, epistemic role? Since this question may invite skepticism, call it a skeptical question for simplicity. Satisfactorily answering this sort of skeptical question about memory is a fundamental epistemological problem. In fact, according to Richard Fumerton (1985), answering it is the most fundamental epistemological problem. If memory has no epistemic role, then we have no reason to believe just about anything we ever learned, or think we learned, at any time in the past.

What is more, memory appears to be involved not just in our retaining what we have learned, but in our very learning. When Chloe tells you “I am changing the oil in my car today,” you use memory even to understand what she is saying–some memory system is responsible for your applying the concepts that make “changing” and “oil” and “car” (and so on) intelligible to you. And you use memory not just to grasp the meaning of words, but also of sentences. Memory is holding fixed in your mind the beginning of Chloe’s statement when she finally says the word “today,” allowing your mind to string concepts together in a way that yields in you a mental representation of what she has testified. Without memory there is no understanding of what is testified. If memory has no epistemic role, then it is hard to see how we could even learn from testimony in the present. Memory seems similarly involved in intuition, reasoning, introspection and perception. Accordingly, it is hard to see how we could learn from those sources if memory plays no epistemic role.

Philosophers have sharpened the general skeptical question about memory into more challenging related sub-questions. This section discusses responses to two of these sub-questions. Answering them is not easy, since they introduce foundational problems that do not arise with other kinds of skepticism. Yet, oddly, philosophers exploring contemporary skepticism have mostly neglected the issue of memory skepticism. Half way through the 20^th century C. I. Lewis (1946) thought the issue was so significant that the level of silence on it even then was “a bit of a scandal.” And the times have not changed.

a. Memory and Accuracy

Consider

(MR) Memory is reliable.

MR states that memory tends to get things right and that it is generally accurate. It does not state that memory is perfectly accurate. A first skeptical question is: why believe MR? If there is no reason to believe MR, then memory may not provide (either by preserving or by generating) any support for what it represents as true in a given case. If you have no sense as to whether, say, a particular political blog tends to get things right, then there may be no sense in believing anything on the mere basis of the blog. Don Locke (1971) thinks that if we have no reason to believe MR, we have no knowledge via memory at all. If he is correct, it may be critical that we identify support for MR.

It is not at all clear that Locke is correct. But even if he is, our troubles are not as severe as they might seem. Suppose we have little to say positively in answer to the first skeptical question. We may still have reason to believe that memory is often correct (correct, say, around 40% of the time), and even that in the kinds of cases we care about it is usually correct. Further, having no reason to believe MR is not the same as having reason to believe MR is false. Having no reason to believe MR may just require us to be neutral about it. Granted, process reliabilists, who must be neutral about MR, may be in trouble. They may have to suspend judgment about whether any given belief that memory preserves is justified, since they must suspend judgment about whether such a belief is preserved by a reliable process. But on other theories of justification, perhaps we remain reasonable in thinking that memory justifies.

Still, it would be somewhat troubling if there were no reasons to believe MR. It would be strange for us to rely so heavily in our reasoning and behavior on something we have no reason to believe is typically accurate. It is worth considering MR’s status for us.

Locke considers the following line of support: doubting MR is self-defeating. To raise doubts about MR requires the use of memory. Raising relevant doubts requires citing examples, in which memory has erred. But memory alone can supply these examples. If these examples impugn MR, it is because memory supports believing something: the fact that it has erred in certain cases. So, the mere attempt to undermine memory itself vindicates memory in a way.

This result is not clearly worth celebrating. We have merely established that memory supports believing that it itself fails here and there. And even if this result is established, it yields no support for MR. Memory may sometimes support belief, but it could nonetheless typically fail to support belief and could be unreliable. But the self-defeat consideration reveals something unique about memory skepticism: using or contemplating arguments for or against it requires the use of the very faculty being scrutinized. We cannot help but use memory, in order to explore memory skepticism. Nothing parallel is true about, say, external-world skepticism. It is not the case that thinking about or offering an argument for and against it must occur via our perceiving something external. Thus, memory skepticism is especially thorny: addressing it uniquely, unfailingly involves some kind of circularity. Thomas Senor (2010) claims that there is no non-circular “demonstration” of MR. If this is true, any demonstration of MR may be suspect.

Richard Brandt (1955) offers an alternative line of support: MR is the best, and only, explanation of our data. What are our data? For Brandt it is our present experience and our having a host of cohering beliefs about the past and about science. According to Brandt (1955: 93), we have these beliefs, because our brains have over time interacted with the world in a truth-conducive way and “the only acceptable theory is one which asserts that a large proportion of our memory beliefs are veridical. No alternative to such a theory has been proposed; nor can one imagine what one would be like.” If MR is the only explanation of our data, MR is by default the best explanation and it may thereby be credible. Contra Senor and others, Brandt thinks this support for MR is non-circular, since it does not take for granted that any recollections are accurate.

But there is reason to think Brandt’s support for MR is indeed circular. To support MR, Brandt makes an explanatory inference based on our data. But why suppose we have the very data he thinks we have–why suppose we have a host of cohering beliefs? That we have them is not wholly manifest to us at one time. We must use memory, in order to appreciate it. We think about our various beliefs, how they fit together, how snug that fit is and we make an inference about how our beliefs cohere. This thinking and inferring is not instantaneous. It unfolds over time and (we presume) memory holds fixed and supports the parts that (we also presume) have already unfolded. So there is a kind of circularity: memory is used in establishing the data MR allegedly explains (see BonJour (2010: 169-171) and Plantinga (1993: 61-4)). If this circularity is vicious, Brandt’s argument yields no new reason for believing MR.

Another objection to Brandt’s argument is that MR is not the only explanation of our data. Bertrand Russell (1921/1995) provides a famous rival hypothesis: we and the world came to exist only five minutes ago and it merely appears that everything is much older. In each of us is a package of cohering beliefs about the past. And we find rings in trees, rust on cars and ruins in Rome. All of this is misleading. Everything is new. As unpalatable as this hypothesis is, it is not easy to disprove. At any rate, it is a rival explanation of our data. Oddly, Brandt actually considers a Russellian hypothesis, but dismisses it as a fantasy, wholly lacking “evidential foundation”. But there is no need for evidence for Russell’s hypothesis, beyond this: it fits the data. Since it does, MR has an explanatory rival. We cannot assume MR is the best explanation. We must do the hard work of showing it is better than Russell’s hypothesis.

b. Memory and the Past

Our target has shifted from defending MR to defending something more basic. Memory could be massively misleading. For any view about the past, why suppose it is even approximately right? That is our second skeptical question. The first skeptical question challenges our view about how memory performs overall. It still allows that memory provides reason to accept some appearances about the past. The second question goes further, probing each appearance. It challenges our view about memory’s performance in each given case. Answering this question well is especially demanding.

Senor (2010) claims that most philosophers agree that Russell’s hypothesis has not been refuted. Regardless of whether Senor and these philosophers are correct, note that the demand here is greater than just refuting the particular hypothesis that Russell offered. Russell’s exact hypothesis may be bad: it seems ad hoc and uninformative. The present demand is to show why all hypotheses like Russell’s are inferior. One hypothesis similar to his is that the world and its inhabitants all popped into existence six minutes ago. Another is that the world is as old as it seems, but just its inhabitants popped into existence five minutes ago. In order to reasonably hold our commonsensical beliefs about the past, we must have reason to reject each skeptical hypothesis that is incompatible with the truth of our commonsensical beliefs. Moreover, we must have reason to think that what we commonsensically believe explains better our data than the entire disjunction of skeptical hypotheses does.

Russell proposes a pragmatic answer to the second skeptical question. Taking memory appearances at face value is extremely practical. We cannot help but do it and it works. Skepticism, therefore, poses no genuine threat. This answer appeals to something like the practical rationality of believing that the past really is how it seems. But this answer tells us nothing about the epistemic rationality of believing anything about the past. Even if Russell is right, we do not have on that account a key ingredient for knowledge of the past: epistemic justification.

One family of replies to the second skeptical question uses transcendental arguments to reject Russell’s hypothesis. A transcendental argument is of this form: A obtains; A is impossible in the absence of B; (therefore) B obtains. Norman Malcolm (1963) and Sydney Shoemaker (1967) offer the following transcendental argument: we know how to make past-tense statements; this competence requires that most of these statements are true; (therefore) most of these statements are true. Since these statements express our beliefs about the past, most of these beliefs are true. Not only does MR follow, but it also follows that the past tends to fit our expressed views about it.

The general idea behind this argument is that one’s having skill at using a kind of statement is incompatible with one’s systematically misusing it. If Elmer sincerely refers to toasters, clouds and orange things as “rabbits,” then Elmer must not be using that word to talk about rabbits. There must be an alternative way of understanding his “rabbits” expressions, such that they tend to be true. Now, we are competent at making statements about the past. It follows that most of these statements are true and so are our corresponding beliefs.

Don Locke (1971: 135-7) offers a transcendental argument for MR (compare Lewis (1946)), which may also answer the second skeptical question. The fact that we have knowledge at all and that we inquire, requires that we have memory knowledge. And we in fact know things and we in fact inquire. (In support of this claim we might note that it seems readily proven: are we inquiring? Yes!). So there is memory knowledge. And, as noted earlier, Locke thinks that if there is memory knowledge, then MR is true. So, he concludes that MR is true. If Locke is right, it follows that Russell’s hypothesis is false. The world did not come into existence five minutes ago. Many hypotheses like Russell’s will also be false. This may answer the second skeptical question. Our reason to suppose that a given belief about the past is true is that it is of a class of beliefs that tend to be correct.

Some philosophers doubt that transcendental arguments can rationally support any anti-skeptical conclusions. But even if some can, the transcendental arguments covered here are questionable. Malcolm and Shoemaker take it as a datum that we know how to make past-tense statements. But why accept the datum? In answer, we can at best cite the kinds of statements we can recall ourselves competently making. And why suppose that the past resembles those recollections? If we popped into existence five minutes ago, those recollections are misleading. If the transcendental argument simply assumes that the recollections are accurate, then the argument fails to generate support for believing that they are accurate.

Similarly, in reply to Locke: why suppose we inquire? You might blush with embarrassment and note that to ask that question is to inquire. But why suppose a question has been asked? Observing inquiry may rely on memory. Perhaps we cannot even think at all or observe a case of inquiry all in one moment. Perhaps thought and observation are always extended in time and we may need to use memory, in order to observe the temporal extension of anything.

As noted, a transcendental argument is of the form: A obtains; A is impossible in the absence of B; (therefore) B obtains. The replies to the transcendental arguments here question the first premise. To support anything as data, we may need to use memory. If that is correct, it may seem viciously circular then to use this data, in order to support either memory or beliefs about the past.

However, one might think that this reveals that memory skepticism is indeed self-defeating. Merely raising a skeptical challenge to MR or to views about the past uses some data about memory or the past. This data may include the fact that observing inquiry requires memory, or that Russell’s hypothesis is compatible with one’s having a given recollection. But if we need to use memory in order to support any data, then raising a skeptical challenge about memory uses memory. So, anyone who offers such a challenge undermines her own position. If memory truly supported nothing, skepticism could have no support.

This line of reasoning notes a conflict between an activity (supporting memory skepticism) and a theory (memory skepticism). Unfortunately, even if there is a conflict, the theory may still be correct (compare Bernecker (2008: 130-1) and Fumerton (1995: 52)). Why believe memory skepticism is false? Even if supporting memory skepticism is self-defeating, it may still be true. And, we may still be justified in believing memory skepticism, but simply unable to demonstrate its support.

Finally, Sven Bernecker (2008: 131-3) attempts to “disarm” Russell’s hypothesis and skepticism about the past by taking a relevant alternatives approach (see Contextualism in Epistemology). Bernecker thinks memory can provide us with knowledge about the past, even if we do not know that there is a past and even if we do not know that Russell’s hypothesis is false. Here is why: a table can be flat, even if it appears bumpy under a microscope. The table is not relevantly bumpy, so it counts as flat. Bernecker thinks knowledge is similar to flatness. S’s knowing that p does not require that S is able to know every alternative to p to be false. S might know that p and yet be unable to rule out some situation in which not-p is true. All S must be able to rule out are the relevant alternatives to p–the relevant situations in which not-p is true.

For example, in order for you to know that Plato taught Aristotle, you must be able to rule out the relevant alternatives to that fact. One relevant alternative is that Socrates alone taught Aristotle. And you can rule this out: you have reason to believe that Socrates swigged his poisoned hemlock years before Aristotle’s birth. Although Russell’s hypothesis is an alternative, to what you believe about the past and you may be unable to rule out, Bernecker thinks it is ordinarily an irrelevant alternative. So memory can provide knowledge of the past even when you cannot rule out Russell’s hypothesis.

Bernecker’s reply faces difficult objections. It is not obvious that knowledge is sufficiently like flatness. Supposing it is, it is unclear that Russell’s hypothesis is ordinarily irrelevant. And, supposing it is, why agree that we can rule out the alternatives that are relevant? What enables you to rule out that Socrates alone taught Aristotle–evidence from memory? The strength of this evidence should be in question if Russell’s hypothesis is not yet ruled out. But, supposing we can rule out the relevant alternatives, Bernecker’s reply may leave us unsatisfied. At best it secures for us bits of knowledge about the past, yet it does not secure knowledge that the past exists or knowledge that Russell’s hypothesis is false. The latter two results seem simply to concede victory to an unpalatable skepticism. And they pair oddly with the former result–how could we simultaneously have knowledge about the past from memory and yet lack knowledge from memory that the past exists? Whatever ultimately explains the one, suggests the other is false.

It is clear that satisfactorily answering the skeptical questions is not easy. There have been other attempts to answer them, but none more promising or developed than those mentioned here (for additional discussion, see Locke (1971) and Bernecker (2008)). Since memory skepticism threatens most of our knowledge and justification, failing to rule it out would be uncomfortable. Still, for two reasons it would be premature to despair. First, even if we cannot show that memory skepticism is false, it is unclear what is thereby threatened or what we are thereby required to believe, if anything. This is because even if memory skepticism is true, it is unclear what we can conclude (compare BonJour (2010: 170-1)). If memory must support any justifying inference or data about the past and memory cannot support, then what can we are justified in inferring from the truth of memory skepticism? It is hard to say. Second, we should not confuse our failing to disprove memory skepticism with our having no reason to believe anything about the past or having reason to deny MR. It could very well be that memory is reliable and justifying, but that we simply have a hard time showing it.

5. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. “An Internalist Externalism.” Synthese 74.3 (1988): 265–283.
- Offers an externalist theory of justification that respects key epistemic roles of mental phenomena.
Annis, David B. “Memory and Justification.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 40.3 (1980): 324–333.
- An article weighing in on several main issues concerning memory and justification, including preservationism, anti-generativism and the Problem of Forgotten Defeat.
Anscombe, G. E. M. Collected Philosophical Papers, Vol. 2: Metaphysics and the Philosophy of Mind. University of Minnesota Press, 1981.
- The chapter “Memory, ‘Experience’, and Causation” discusses the relationship between remembering and knowledge.
Audi, Robert. “Dispositional Beliefs and Dispositions to Believe.” Nous 28.4 (1994): 416–434.
- Distinguishes beliefs that are stored (dispositional beliefs) from inclinations to form beliefs. Likens memory to a computer.
Audi, Robert. “Memorial Justification.” Philosophical Topics 23.1 (1995): 31–45.
- Discusses from an internalist perspective a number of topics concerning memory.
Audi, Robert. “The Place of Testimony in the Fabric of Knowledge and Justification.” American Philosophical Quarterly 34.4 (1997): 405–422.
- Discusses a version of preservationism about knowledge and memory’s similarity to testimony in epistemology.
Audi, Robert.. “The Sources of Knowledge.” The Oxford Handbook of Epistemology. Ed. Paul K. Moser. Oxford University Press, 2002. 71–94.
- Defends generativism and an epistemic theory of memory.
Augustine. Confessions. Ed. H. Chadwick. Oxford University Press, 1991.
- In Book X, describes memory in terms of a storehouse.
Ayer, A. J. The Problem of Knowledge. Vol. 8. Harmondsworth, 1956.
- Chapter 4 endorses the epistemic theory of memory and other connections between memory and knowledge.
Bartlett, Frederic. Remembering: a Study in Experimental and Social Psychology. Cambridge University Press, 1932.
- Commonly thought to be the first work in psychology to present memory as generative.
Bergson, Henri. Matter and Memory. Trans. N.M. Paul and W.S. Palmer. Zone Books, 1896/1994.
- Early distinction of memory systems by a philosopher.
Bernecker, Sven. Memory: A Philosophical Study. Oxford University Press, 2010.
- One of the only recent philosophical monographs on memory, this book develops themes from Bernecker’s earlier work, defends generativism and attacks the epistemic theory of memory.
Bernecker, Sven. The Metaphysics of Memory. Springer, 2008.
- Thorough philosophical discussion of many metaphysical and some epistemological issues bearing on memory, including skepticism about memory and problems for internalism.
BonJour, Laurence. Epistemology: Classic Problems and Contemporary Responses. Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 2010.
- Written for a general philosophical audience, chapter 8 introduces many problems in the epistemology of memory.
Brandt, Richard B. “The Epistemological Status of Memory Beliefs.” Philosophical Review 64.1 (1955): 78–95.
- Provides an inference to the best explanation reply to memory skepticism.
Burge, Tyler. “Interlocution, Perception, and Memory.” Philosophical Studies 86.1 (1997): 21–47.
- Endorses preservationism and anti-generativism, while alleging parallels between memory and testimony.
Comesaña, Juan. “Evidentialist Reliabilism.” Noûs 44.4 (2010): 571–600.
- States an evidentialist version of process reliabilism.
Conee, Earl, and Richard Feldman. “Evidence.” Epistemology: New Essays. Ed. Quentin Smith. Oxford University Press, 2008.
- The best-known defenders of evidentialism develop and clarify several aspects of their theory.
Conee, Earl, and Richard Feldman. “Internalism Defended.” American Philosophical Quarterly 38.1 (2001): 1–18.
- Defends internalism from the Problem of Forgotten Evidence, the Problem of Stored Beliefs and other objections.
Conee, Earl, and Richard Feldman. “Replies.” Evidentialism and Its Discontents. Ed. Trent Dougherty. Oxford University Press, 2011.
- Proposes a dispositionalist solution to the Problem of Stored Beliefs.
Debus, Dorothea. “Accounting for Epistemic Relevance: A New Problem for the Causal Theory of Memory.” American Philosophical Quarterly 47.1 (2010): 17–29.
- Considers generative aspects of memory, while criticizing Martin and Deutscher’s rival to the epistemic theory of memory.
Dummett, Michael. “Testimony and Memory.” Knowing From Words. Ed. A. Chakrabarti and B. K. Matilal. Kluwer, 1994. 251–272.
- Likens memory to testimony and endorses anti-generativism.
Feldman, Richard. “Having Evidence.” Philosophical Analysis. Ed. D. F. Austin. Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1988. 83–104.
- Proposes that justified stored beliefs usually only have stored justifications.
Feldman, Richard. “Justification Is Internal.” Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Ed. Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Blackwell, 2005. 270–84.
- Defends internalism from the Problem of Forgotten Defeat.
Feldman, Richard, and Earl Conee. “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies 48.1 (1985): 15–34.
- The most influential paper to state and advocate evidentialism.
Fumerton, Richard A. Metaepistemology and Skepticism. Rowman & Littlefield, 1995.
- Brings out the difficulty of satisfactorily rejecting memory skepticism.
Fumerton, Richard A. Metaphysical and Epistemological Problems Of Perception. Lincoln: University Nebraska Press, 1985.
- Highlights the importance of the epistemology of memory to epistemology in general.
Ginet, Carl. Knowledge, Perception, and Memory. Vol. 26. D. Reidel Pub. Co., 1975.
- Perhaps the first contemporary statement of dispositionalism.
Goldman, Alvin I. “Internalism, Externalism, and the Architecture of Justification.” Journal of Philosophy 106.6 (2009): 309–338.
- Argues for externalism and against internalism in light of the epistemology of memory.
Goldman, Alvin I. “Internalism Exposed.” Journal of Philosophy 96.6 (1999): 271–293.
- An influential criticism of internalism that has drawn attention to the Problem of Forgotten Evidence and the Problem of Stored Beliefs.
Goldman, Alvin I. “Toward a Synthesis of Reliabilism and Evidentialism? Or: Evidentialism’s Troubles, Reliabilism’s Rescue Package.” Evidentialism and Its Discontents. Ed. Trent Dougherty. Oxford University Press, 2011.
- Continues to press several objections to internalism rooted in the epistemology of memory and sketches a version of reliabilism that incorporates evidentialist insights.
Greco, John. “Justification Is Not Internal.” Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Ed. Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Blackwell, 2005. 257–269.
- Attacks internalism in light of the Problem of Forgotten Defeat, among other problems.
Harman, Gilbert. Change in View. MIT Press, 1986.
- Chapter 4 responds to the Problem of Forgotten Evidence and has popularized it.
Huemer, Michael. “The Problem of Memory Knowledge.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 80.4 (1999): 346–357.
- Endorses the Problem of Forgotten Defeat, yet also a form of generativism.
Lackey, Jennifer. “Memory as a Generative Epistemic Source.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70.3 (2005): 636–658.
- Argues for generativism and against anti-generativism.
Lackey, Jennifer. “Why Memory Really Is a Generative Epistemic Source: A Reply to Senor.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 74.1 (2007): 209–219.
- Defends her earlier arguments for generativism and against anti-generativism from Thomas Senor’s objections.
Lewis, Clarence I. An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. Open Court, 1946.
- Early and influential discussion of memory skepticism.
Locke, Don. Memory. Vol. 13. Macmillan, 1971.
- One of the few book-length philosophical discussions of memory. Nearly all replies to memory skepticism on offer are scrutinized and a transcendental argument against memory skepticism is advanced.
Malcolm, Norman. Knowledge and Certainty. Englewood Cliffs, N.J., Prentice-Hall, 1963.
- Defends the epistemic theory of memory and a transcendental argument against memory skepticism.
Martin, Charles B., and Max Deutscher. “Remembering.” Philosophical Review 75.April (1966): 161–96.
- One of the first criticisms of the epistemic theory of memory. Presents an influential rival theory.
McCain, Kevin. Evidentialism and Epistemic Justification. Routledge, 2014.
- Develops and defends what may be the most complete and detailed statement of an evidentialist, internalist theory of justification. Advocates a “stored justifications” type reply to some problems in the epistemology of memory.
McGrath, Matthew. “Memory and Epistemic Conservatism.” Synthese 157.1 (2007): 1–24.
- Uses the epistemology of memory, in order to criticize evidentialism and to defend a rival internalist theory of justification.
Michaelian, Kourken. “Generative Memory.” Philosophical Psychology 24.3 (2011a): 323–342.
- Assembles wide-ranging cognitive psychological research in an effort to challenge the storehouse model of memory and to advance a generative model. Sketches how reliabilism might accommodate a generative model.
Michaelian, Kourken. “Is Memory a Natural Kind?” Memory Studies 4.2 (2011b): 170–189.
- Empirically informed philosophical discussion of the various memory systems. Denies that memory is a natural kind.
Moon, Andrew. “Knowing Without Evidence.” Mind 121.482 (2012): 309–331.
- Presents to evidentialism a knowledge version of the Problem of Stored Beliefs centered on the basis of stored beliefs.
Moon, Andrew. “Remembering Entails Knowing.” Synthese 190.14 (2013): 2717–2729.
- Argues that remembering entails knowing and criticizes Bernecker’s attempts to show otherwise.
Naylor, Andrew. “Belief from the Past.” European Journal of Philosophy 20.4 (2012): 598–620.
- Adopts preservationism, while arguing for a theory about what it is to believe one did something from having done it.
Owens, David J. “A Lockean Theory of Memory Experience.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56.2 (1996): 319–32.
- One of the first arguments for a kind of generativism.
Owens, David J. Reason without Freedom: The Problem of Epistemic Normativity. Routledge, 2000.
- Discusses preservationism, a kind of anti-generativism and the epistemic theory of memory.
Pappas, George S. “Lost Justification.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 5.1 (1980): 127–134.
- An early and underappreciated statement of many problems in the epistemology of memory, including the Problem of Forgotten Evidence and the Problem of Stored Beliefs.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warrant and Proper Function. Oxford University Press, 1993.
- Endorses anti-generativism about warrant and criticizes inference to the best explanation replies to memory skepticism.
Plato. Theaetetus. Trans. H.N. Fowler, Loeb Classical Library. London: William Heineman, 1921.
- Among Western philosophy’s earliest work in the epistemology of memory, endorsing a storehouse model and epistemic theory of memory.
Russell, Bertrand. The Analysis of Mind. London: Routledge, 1921/1995.
- One of the first discussions of memory skepticism, famously hypothesizing that we came to exist only five minutes ago.
Schacter, Daniel L. Searching for Memory: The Brain, the Mind, and the Past. New York: Basic Books, 1996.
- Summarizes a considerable amount of psychological research on memory for a popular audience, with many citations for further reading. Explains how a generative model of memory, rather than a storehouse model, better fits the research.
Schacter, Daniel L. The Seven Sins of Memory: How the Mind Forgets and Remembers. Boston: Mariner Books, 2002.
- Presents for a general audience a wealth of findings on the psychology of memory, exploring whether the general limits of human memory constitute defects. Provides additional references for further reading and supports the generative model of memory.
Senor, Thomas D. “Internalistic Foundationalism and the Justification of Memory Belief.” Synthese 94.3 (1993): 453–476.
- Presents the Problem of Stored Beliefs as a special problem for internalism.
Senor, Thomas D. “Memory.” A Companion to Epistemology. Ed. Jonathan Dancy, Ernest Sosa, and Matthias Steup. Wiley-Blackwell, 2010.
- Concisely surveys many issues in the epistemology of memory.
Senor, Thomas D. “Preserving Preservationism: A Reply to Lackey.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 74.1 (2007): 199–208.
- Defends anti-generativism from Lackey’s criticisms.
Shanton, Karen. “Memory, Knowledge and Epistemic Competence.” Review of Philosophy and Psychology 2.1 (2011): 89–104.
- Argues that a condition, which Ernest Sosa and others think is necessary for knowledge, rules out knowledge from episodic memory.
Shoemaker, Sydney. “Memory.” The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Volume 5. Ed. P. Edwards. Macmillan, 1967. 265–274.
- A summary of the philosophy of memory up to the mid-20^th century. Offers a transcendental argument against memory skepticism.
Williamson, Timothy. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford University Press, 2000.
- Endorses the epistemic theory of memory and the view that all and only evidence is knowledge.

Author Information

Matthew Frise
Email: matthew_frise@baylor.edu
Baylor University
U. S. A.

Locke: Knowledge of the External World

The problem of how we can know the existence and nature of the world external to our mind is one of the oldest and most difficult in philosophy. The discussion by John Locke (1632-1704) of knowledge of the external world have proved to be some of the most confusing and difficult passages of his entire body of philosophical work. Difficulties develop on several fronts.

First, in his main work in epistemology, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, Locke seems to adopt a representative theory of perception. According to Locke, the only things we perceive (at least immediately) are ideas. Many of Locke’s readers have wondered, how can we know the world beyond our ideas if we only ever perceive such ideas?

Second, Locke’s epistemology is built around a strict distinction between knowledge and mere probable opinion or belief. Locke appears to define knowledge, however, so as to rule out the possibility of knowledge of the external world. His definition of knowledge as the perception of agreement between ideas has seemed to many of his readers to restrict knowledge to our own thoughts and ideas. Locke himself, however, emphasizes that knowledge of the external world is neither based on inference or reasoning nor is it based on reflecting on ideas somehow already in the mind. Instead, it is achieved through sensory experience. Thus, knowledge of the external world, even as Locke himself describes it, is clearly not a matter of merely knowing facts about our own minds.

Third, many of the special difficulties of understanding how knowledge of the external world is possible stem from what seem to be devastating skeptical arguments against the possibility of such knowledge. Locke’s approach to skepticism, however, has seemed unfocused and possibly in tension with itself. Locke alternately suggests that skepticism cannot be refuted even if we have at least some good reasons to believe it is mistaken, that genuine skepticism is not psychologically possible for human beings, and that skepticism is incoherent.

Ultimately, examining Locke’s discussions around knowledge of the external world can prove one of the most rewarding points of entry into Locke’s theoretical philosophy. Understanding what Locke thinks knowledge of the external world is and how it fits within his broader epistemology and theoretical philosophy requires probing beyond his epistemology and into the depths of his accounts of perception, representation, and the contents of thought. Properly appreciating his position vis-a-vis skepticism likewise leads to issues concerning Locke’s views on the fundamental nature of reality and our limited ability to grasp it. We can know that there is an external world but not much, if anything, about the nature of the world itself.

What is Locke’s Category of Sensitive Knowledge?
Sensitive Knowledge and Locke’s Broader Epistemology
Sensitive Knowledge and Skepticism about the External World
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Texts
2. Secondary Literature

1. What is Locke’s Category of Sensitive Knowledge?

Suppose that you’re waiting with a friend in a hallway to go into a meeting. While furiously making last minute adjustments to the presentation the two of you are about to give, she asks, “My throat is dry, are there any water fountains around?” You look up and down the hallway, see one at the north end of the hallway and reply, “There’s a water fountain over there.” Your friend gets up, walks to the fountain, and takes a drink.

It seems to many people and many philosophers—including John Locke—that when you said, “there’s a water fountain over there,” you expressed some knowledge to your friend. She acted on that knowledge and quenched her thirst. Your helpful statement expressed a paradigmatic instance of knowledge of the external world. According to Locke there are two main questions to ask about any kind of knowledge, including cases like the knowledge of the external world you shared with your friend. First, what do you know? Second, how do you acquire or achieve such knowledge? This section will explore Locke’s answers to the what and the how of knowledge of the external world.

a. The Content of Sensitive Knowledge

For now we will simply suppose that you did have some knowledge of the external world to share with your friend. Section three below will examine Locke’s replies to various skeptical worries to the effect we have no such knowledge. Assuming that you did have some knowledge to share, what exactly did you know and share with your friend? Or, as we might put it in more technical terms, what is the content of your knowledge in this case? More generally, what do we know in cases of knowledge of the external world?

According to Locke, knowledge of the external world is knowledge of ‘real existence.’ Knowledge of real existence is knowledge that something really exists and is not a mere figment of your imagination. Locke argues that we can know three different kinds of things really exist. First, each person can know their own existence at any given time. I can know now that I exist at this time. You can know, as you read this, that you exist while you read this. Locke’s claim here is reminiscent of Descartes’ claim that we know our own existence in every act of thinking—even when we doubt our own existence. Second, Locke believes that we can know that God exists. Locke offers a proof of God’s existence in Book IV, chapter 10 of the Essay. Third, we can know that other things distinct from our minds really exist. When you said to your friend that there was a water fountain over there, the knowledge of real existence you expressed was of this third kind. As you looked at the fountain you knew that there was then something distinct from your mind really existing—the water fountain. That’s not to say this was the only other thing you knew to exist at that time. Presumably you also knew many other things distinct from your mind to exist at that time: the floor you were standing on, the hallway you waited in, the doors in the hallway, etc. The knowledge you shared with your friend, however, concerned the existence of the water fountain. You knew that the water fountain existed distinct from your mind. In general, knowledge of the external world is knowledge of the existence of a thing distinct from one’s mind.

b. How We Come to have Sensitive Knowledge

Locke gives a somewhat unusual name to knowledge of the external world. It is often called ‘sensory knowledge,’ but Locke calls such knowledge ‘sensitive knowledge.’ He uses this phrase to mark the distinct way that we achieve knowledge of the external world. There is something special, according to Locke, about how knowledge of the external world is achieved that sets it apart from how knowledge of other matters, such as mathematical knowledge, is achieved. Knowledge of the external world is known ‘sensitively’—rather than ‘intuitively’ or ‘demonstratively.’ Locke calls these three ways of coming to knowledge the three degrees of knowledge. Before examining what Locke means when he says that knowledge of the external world is achieved sensitively, it is helpful to consider the other ways Locke believes we come to knowledge—the other ‘degrees’ of knowledge.

According to Locke, knowledge of the external world is different than what he calls intuitive knowledge. Intuitive knowledge is knowledge that we grasp immediately and without any need for proof or explanation. For example, anyone who has ideas of the colors white and black and compares those ideas immediately knows that white is not black. This is the kind of knowledge we often have concerning the meanings of words, at least when words are given explicit definition. To use one of Locke’s examples, if ‘gold’ is defined as a yellow metal, then we can know that gold is yellow. In calling knowledge of the external world ‘sensitive knowledge’ Locke is again marking that such knowledge is distinct from intuitive knowledge.

Locke also holds that knowledge of the external world is different than the kind of knowledge we achieve through proofs or argument. When someone proves that the sum of the three interior angles of a triangle is equal to the sum of two right angles through a proof with multiple steps, Locke calls such knowledge demonstrative knowledge. Locke would say that such a person has demonstrated their conclusion. Demonstrative knowledge, for Locke, is knowledge arrived at by what is called a ‘deductive argument’ today. Locke calls knowledge of the external world ‘sensitive knowledge’ to mark that he does not take it to be a kind of demonstrative knowledge. Knowledge of the external world is not arrived at by any such argument or proof.

Knowledge of the external world is not achieved through thinking about the definitions of our terms or comparing ideas that we have already acquired. Knowledge of the external world doesn’t rest on any proof of the external world. Instead, knowledge of the external world is achieved in sensory experience. It is through the entrance of an idea into our mind through the senses that we have knowledge of the external world. Locke writes, “’Tis therefore the actual receiving of ideas from without that gives us notice of the existence of other things and makes us know that something doth exist at that time without us which causes that idea in us…” (E Book IV, chapter 11, section 2). Suppose that the water fountain you saw was newly installed and had a fresh coat of crimson paint. As you looked at the water fountain and light reflected from the fountain to your eyes an idea of that distinct crimson color entered your mind. According to Locke, as the sensation of that color entered your mind you knew that something crimson existed distinct from your mind by its somehow producing that sensation in you.

Your knowledge of the existence of something crimson is therefore acquired in a way distinct from either intuitive or demonstrative knowledge. It does not depend on a proof or on comparing ideas already existing in your mind. Such knowledge is achieved upon looking at the water fountain and the water fountain’s effect on your mind through your senses.

c. The Limitations of Sensitive Knowledge

So far, then, we have seen both the what and the how of knowledge of the external world according to Locke. What we know is real existence. How we know it is through sensation—through the reception of ideas into our minds. The what and the how combine to place some severe limits on what Locke thinks we can know about the external world.

First, our knowledge of the external world only extends as far as current sensory experience. As you look at the water fountain you know that it now exists. When you look away from the water fountain as you turn back to your friend, you no longer know that it now exists. You only now know that it existed when you were looking at it. Similarly, you do not know that it existed before you looked at it. Locke does think that it is highly probable for you that the water fountain existed before and after you look at it. Indeed, he thinks that it is nearly, if not completely, impossible for you to avoid believing that the fountain existed before you saw it and continues to exist after you turn away. Your belief that the water fountain exists when you are not looking at it, then, is both rational and psychologically compelling, according to Locke. Our knowledge extends over relatively little of the world we ordinarily believe to exist. We only know to exist the sensible objects of our immediate sensory environment that are currently affecting us.

Second, we only know the world as it appears to us through our senses. We do not know its underlying nature as it is in itself. This point can be helpfully illustrated by considering a new case. Suppose, for example, that you go on a field trip to gold country. You and the rest of the class dip a sieve into the river and sift out a few flakes of a yellowish metal. The class then goes into a mine, chips off chunks of rock, crush them up, and sift out more pieces of yellowish metal from the crushed stone. At the end of the field trip the class spreads all of the collected pieces of yellowish metal in front of them. As you survey the spread of hunks of yellowish metal you can know that there now exist several distinct objects that affect your mind by producing certain ideas in it—sensations of yellow, solidity, etc. What you do not know is that there is some underlying nature that now exists in each of these hunks of stuff. Moreover, you do not know that they all have the same underlying nature. We are ignorant, in other words, about both the underlying nature of each individual object as well as whether the objects that appear similarly to us have similar underlying natures. There may be tremendous evidence supporting the theory that describes the underlying microstructure of these hunks of stuff and even explains why a microstructure of that type produces the appearances you now see. Such microstructure or underlying nature, however, is not part of how the hunks of stuff now appear to you. Thus, while it may be overwhelmingly probable that some underlying common nature exists in all of the things spread before you, you do not know that that nature exists before you.

One way to make vivid the drastic nature of this limitation on knowledge of the external world is to consider different possible uses of a word like ‘gold.’ If we use the word ‘gold’ to refer to an underlying nature, such as underlying chemical or atomic structure, then on Locke’s view we do not know that gold exists. The belief that gold exists would be a very rational one to hold, based on all of the evidence we have to support our best physical and chemical theories. Nevertheless, such a belief would not be knowledge. If, on the other hand, we use the word ‘gold’ to pick out a category of things which appear to us in a certain distinct way, we may know that gold exists when we experience it. So, for example, if I use ‘gold’ to mean a heavy, yellowish, metallic-feeling thing, then I may know that gold exists when I experience a heavy, yellowish, metallic-feeling thing. Insofar as people use ‘gold’ in the former sense to pick out a chemical or physical kind, rather than in the latter sense to describe a category of thing with a particular sensory appearance, then we do not know that gold exists. In the terminology Locke develops in the Essay, one way to understand this point is that while we can never know that any particular ‘real essence’ exists, we can know that a kind of thing with a certain nominal essence exists.

Third, knowledge of the external world does not extend to other minds. Recall that Locke takes knowledge of the external world to be sensitive knowledge. Sensitive knowledge is achieved as a result of things operating on us through our senses. Locke does not think that other minds affect us directly through our senses. (Our own mind produces ideas in us through what Locke calls reflection, a kind of inner sense directed at our own mind.) At best, the minds of other creatures, including other human beings and other people, affect the behavior of such creatures’ bodies. Those bodies then affect our minds through our senses. As a result, no other minds directly produce ideas in our minds through our senses. Locke does think it overwhelmingly probable, given the similarity of the behavior of other human beings to one’s own behavior, that other human beings, at least, have minds (see 4.11.12). Moreover, believing that other human beings (or even other ‘lower’ animals) have minds may be psychologically irresistible for us (that is, solipsism may not be a real psychological option for us). So, as in the case of believing that objects continue to exist when we don’t experience them, Locke sees belief in other minds as both rationally and psychologically compelling but he does not see it as knowledge.

Overall, then, we can sum up Locke’s account of the how and the what of knowledge of the external world as follows:

What: in particular instances of knowledge of the external world we know the existence of a thing external to our mind. When you saw the water fountain, for example, you knew that a crimson thing, that is a thing with a power to produce a certain sensation in you, then existed.

How: in particular instances of knowledge of the external world we know the existence of a thing with various powers to affect our mind by producing ideas in our mind by virtue of our awareness of the entrance of those ideas into our mind. When you saw the water fountain, for example, you knew that a thing produced a certain visual idea in your mind at that time; that a crimson sensation was then entering your mind.

2. Sensitive Knowledge and Locke’s Broader Epistemology

In section 1 we explored what sensitive knowledge is: what do we know? how do we know it? what are some of the—perhaps surprising—limitations Locke places on sensitive knowledge? This section will explore what has seemed to many to be one of the most puzzling aspects of Locke’s discussion of sensitive knowledge—its compatibility with Locke’s own definition of knowledge. This is a question of how to integrate Locke’s discussion of sensitive knowledge with his broader epistemology. There is a large range of opinion among Locke scholars on whether Locke’s definition of knowledge is compatible with sensitive knowledge, but until very recently most of it was overwhelming pessimistic. Most of Locke’s readers have thought that sensitive knowledge can’t fit under Locke’s official definition of knowledge and is incompatible with his broader epistemology. More recently, however, Locke scholars have attempted to explain how sensitive knowledge can be explained in the terms of Locke’s official definition of knowledge.

After introducing Locke’s definition of knowledge and laying out its prima facie incompatibility with sensitive knowledge, this section will briefly explain various attempts that have been made to integrate sensitive knowledge with Locke’s epistemology.

a. Locke’s Definition of Knowledge

The final Book of the Essay is dedicated to knowledge and opinion. Locke begins Book IV with a definition of knowledge. To appreciate the potential tension between the definition of knowledge and sensitive knowledge it is worth quoting the definition at length. Locke writes:

Knowledge then seems to me to be nothing but the perception of the connection and agreement, or disagreement and repugnancy of any of our ideas. In this alone it consists. Where this perception is, there is knowledge, and where it is not, there, though we may fancy, guess, or believe, yet we always come short of knowledge. E IV.i.2 (emphases original)

Locke and his readers frequently shorten this definition of knowledge by calling knowledge the perception of agreement of ideas. This entry will adopt that convention.

There are important questions about Locke’s definition of knowledge that bear on its compatibility with sensitive knowledge. Foremost is how to resolve an ambiguity in the definition. There are two ways to read the second ‘of’ in ‘the perception of agreement of ideas.’ First, one could read it as saying that knowledge is the perception of agreement of ideas with something or other, not necessarily another idea. Second, one may read the definition as stating that knowledge is the perception of agreement between ideas—the perception of agreement of one idea with another idea. As we will see below in section 2.7, one route to resolving the tension between sensitive knowledge and Locke’s definition of knowledge is to adopt the first interpretation of the definition. Most of Locke’s readers, however, have rejected this option. In the margin next to the paragraph following the definition of knowledge, Locke noted in his personal copy of the Essay that knowledge is the perception of agreement between two ideas. Following this lead, nearly all of Locke’s readers have taken the second reading, that Locke defines knowledge as the perception of agreement between ideas.

Having fixed an interpretation of Locke’s definition of knowledge, we can now turn to bringing out the tension between Locke’s definition of knowledge and sensitive knowledge. To begin, one might wonder: what does an agreement between two ideas tell us about what exists beyond those ideas? Knowledge of the external world, according to Locke, is knowledge of the existence of something distinct from our mind (and so, of course, distinct from the ideas in our mind). Even Locke himself notes that the mere existence of an idea of something does not guarantee the existence of what that idea is an idea of. Merely having an idea of a freshly painted crimson water fountain does not guarantee that a freshly painted crimson water fountain really exists. At this point, if there is to be any hope, we ought to take a step back and ask: what are the two ideas that agree in sensitive knowledge? It seems clear that if I know the crimson water fountain exists, my idea of it will be one of the ideas. What is the second idea?

We might start making progress on this question by considering the content of sensitive knowledge. As detailed in section one above, we know that a thing exists distinct from our mind. For example, when you saw the freshly painted crimson water fountain down the hall, you knew that a crimson thing really exists. Perhaps, then, sensitive knowledge involves the perception of agreement between the idea of a thing and the idea of real existence. When you look down the hall and know the water fountain exists you perceive an agreement between your idea of the crimson water fountain and the idea of real existence.

One difficult question facing this view is that it’s not clear how to make sense of the idea of real existence agreeing with the idea of anything (except, perhaps, the idea of God). The problem here can be made vivid by adopting a particular understanding of what it is for ideas to agree. On a popular way of interpreting Locke’s account of knowledge, perceiving an agreement between ideas is perceiving some sort of connection between the ideas. In proving, for example, that the sum of the interior angles of a triangle is equal to the sum of two right angles, one perceives through a series of steps that the ideas are connected by the relation of equality. But what would the connection between the idea of real existence and the idea of a thing, such as your idea of the freshly painted crimson water fountain, be? It certainly can’t be that the idea of the freshly painted crimson water fountain entails the idea of real existence since it isn’t necessary that the water fountain exists. Again, contrast sensitive knowledge with intuitive knowledge of the meaning of a term. If ‘gold’ is defined as a yellow metal, then, the idea of yellow is entailed by the idea of gold; it is contained within it. Any thing that is a yellow metal is yellow. But in the case of my idea of the crimson water fountain it’s not true that anything that is a crimson water fountain really exists. The crimson water fountain between the houses of Santa Claus and the Easter Bunny, for example, doesn’t really exist. What, then, is the connection between the ideas perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge and how is such a connection perceived through sensory experience?

We might try to sum up the problem facing Locke’s account as follows. Locke’s definition of knowledge appears to make all knowledge a priori. That is, it seems to make all knowledge depend on reflecting and comparing our ideas to one another in an attempt to understand relations between our ideas. But knowledge of the external world is patently not a priori. What (contingently, at least) exists in the world can’t be known to exist merely by reflecting on our own thoughts. In the remainder of this section, we’ll explore various approaches to the question of whether and how Locke’s definition of knowledge can accommodate sensitive knowledge. As we will see, the question of how to integrate sensitive knowledge with Locke’s account of knowledge brings us to consider many central aspects of Locke’s theoretical philosophy beyond his epistemology.

b. Sensitive Knowledge as Incompatible with Locke’s Definition of Knowledge

One tradition that stretches back to Locke’s first readers is simply that Locke bungled his epistemology. One of Locke’s most public critics was Edward Stillingfleet, Bishop of Worcester. Locke and Stillingfleet corresponded in a series of public letters. One of the very first criticisms Stillingfleet leveled at Locke was that his definition of knowledge in terms of ideas makes knowledge of the real world, including even knowledge of its existence, impossible. This criticism persisted even into the twentieth century. Locke, such readers maintain, makes all knowledge a priori. Knowledge of the external world is not a priori. Therefore, Locke’s definition makes knowledge of the external world impossible. Locke’s repeated insistence that we do have sensitive knowledge despite its incompatibility with his definition, such readers maintain, is a result either of his failure to recognize the problem or of a dogmatic insistence that we have such knowledge. The former option is not particularly plausible in light of Locke’s correspondence with Stillingfleet. In fact, Locke responds to Stillingfleet’s charge by describing the ideas perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge. We will shortly have a chance to consider Locke’s response in section 2.4 below. For now it is enough to recognize that Locke surely did not simply miss the apparent problem. That leaves us with the second option. Locke, on this view, brought out a tension with excruciating clarity but was not able to resolve it and instead merely wallowed in it clinging to both sources of the tension.

Though historical figures are as prone to error and clinging to positions they cannot adequately defend as any of us, it is generally best to explain such error or dogmatic clinging rather than simply leave it as unexplained brute failure. Those who think that Locke simply crashed headlong into the tension between knowledge of the external world and his definition of knowledge without offering much in the way of resolution often explain Locke’s position as a result of his particular period in history. Locke, on these views, found himself caught between the expanding and improving new science, and its mechanistic world view, on the one hand, and an old epistemological paradigm with its emphasis on certainty, on the other. The tension between Locke’s claims about sensitive knowledge and his definition of knowledge reflects this broader tension at large during Locke’s life between the changing shape and power of empirical inquiry and attitudes about knowledge.

c. Sensitive Knowledge and Locke’s Theory of Representation

A second approach to making sense of Locke’s claim that we have sensitive knowledge despite its apparent tension with his definition of knowledge attempts to find resolution in Locke’s philosophy of mind. The basic aim of this approach is to show how sensitive knowledge fits with the broader spirit of Locke’s philosophy even if it runs against the letter of his epistemology. Locke, on these views, supplements his official definition of knowledge with a tacit reliabilism about knowledge when it comes to knowledge of the external world. The groundwork for Locke’s reliabilism is to be found in his account of the meaning of a special kind of idea. To appreciate this approach it will help to take a step back and consider in some detail Locke’s account of how the mind comes to acquire its ideas.

Locke’s aim in Book II of the Essay is to demonstrate how all of our ideas can be acquired through experience. To this end, Locke divides ideas into simple and complex ideas. Simple ideas are passively received by the mind and have no other ideas as parts. So, for example, when I bite into a pineapple I might receive several different simple ideas. One such idea would be the taste of the pineapple. Another might be the feeling of solidity or resistance as I bite into it. Yet another might be the particular wet, slippery texture of the fruit in my mouth, etc. After I’m done chewing it, I might notice a particular sticky texture left on my fingers where I held the fruit. The taste, the various textures, the different shades of yellow, all are different simple ideas for Locke. More specifically, these are all simple ideas of sensation; simple ideas produced in the mind by things outside of the mind operating on it through the senses. Locke also holds that we have simple ideas of reflection. Simple ideas of reflection are ideas of the mind’s own operations. They are ideas produced in the mind when those operations are active. Reflection, Locke thinks, is like our outer senses but directed at the mind’s own activity rather than at an external world. All of these simple ideas of reflection and sensation are passively received by the mind.

Complex ideas are ideas produced by the mind operating on ideas that are somehow already in the mind, whether simple or complex. One way to form complex ideas is by putting two ideas together. One might, for example, combine the visual appearance of a banana with the taste of a pineapple in imagining a ‘pineana.’ Or one might compare a fruit fly crawling on a pineapple to the pineapple itself to form the idea of the larger than relation. Or, one might combine ideas of certain bodily movements corresponding to certain forms of music to make the idea of a dance. All of these would be complex ideas. The operations Locke most frequently discusses are operations of combining ideas, comparing ideas, and abstracting ideas.

The central thrust of Locke’s account of the origins of our ideas is that given a certain set of simple ideas and a certain set of mental operations we can explain how we get all of the ideas we have. Sensation, reflection, and operations of the mind can explain all of the ideas human beings have according to Locke. That is, all of the contents of our thoughts can be traced to origins in sensation or reflection and some combination of mental operations.

Locke’s category of simple ideas is relevant to sensitive knowledge because it occupies a special place within his broader theory of ideas. Simple ideas of sensation are unique among all ideas in that they both represent the external world as well as represent their object perfectly. Some of Locke’s readers have concluded that this unique place in Locke’s theory of ideas makes simple ideas of sensation ripe for use in understanding Locke’s claims about sensitive knowledge.

We can consider each of these features of simple ideas—that they represent external reality and that they represent it perfectly well—in comparison to other ideas. Simple ideas are produced in our minds by other things operating on us. As a result, Locke claims, they represent the power to produce those ideas—that is, the object a simple idea perfectly represents is the power to produce that idea. Simple ideas are not the only ideas that represent mind-independent reality, however. Our ideas of things, whether particular individuals or kinds of things, also represent mind-independent reality. Locke calls this type of idea ideas of substances and they are complex ideas. For example, my idea of a particular individual horse, Mr. Ed, is an idea of a substance. It is an idea of a particular thing which has various qualities. Ideas of substances are therefore ideas that represent (or at least purport to represent) extra-mental reality.

We have other ideas besides simple ideas and ideas of substances, however. We also have ideas of relations and modes. For reasons that go beyond the scope of this entry, Locke does not take our ideas of either kind to represent mind-independent reality. Simple ideas and ideas of substances alone among all ideas represent the external world.

Though simple and substance ideas are alike in representing the external world, they differ with respect to how well they represent the world. Only simple ideas, according to Locke, represent the external world perfectly. Whether an idea of a particular individual substance (Mr. Ed) or an idea of a kind of substance (horses), our ideas of substances all fail to some degree in representing what they aim to represent. To see this difference, we can first consider why simple ideas represent their object perfectly. According to Locke, simple ideas represent the power to produce those ideas in us. That is all they represent. Ideas of substances, by contrast, purport to represent an individual or kind of individual. To do so requires representing that individual or kind as having all and only the qualities it in fact has. If my idea of Mr. Ed does not include an idea of the color of his eyes, then my idea of Mr. Ed falls short of representing Mr. Ed as he really is. It is not, in Locke’s terms, an adequate idea. Similarly, if my idea of Mr. Ed represents him as having a dark spot above his tail, but Mr. Ed does not have such a spot, my idea is again an inadequate idea. Now, to have an adequate idea of a particular substance or kind of substance would be to represent not only all of its sensible qualities—that is, ideas of all of the ways in which it can affect our senses—but also to have ideas of all of its abilities to affect other things. It seems clear—at least in Locke’s mind—that no amount of humanly possible experimentation could ever reveal that degree of detail. At the very least, we simply cannot bring any given thing to interact with all of the other things in the universe to understand the effects it may have on them or them on it.

Simple ideas of sensation, then, stand alone as ideas that both represent the external world and perfectly represent it. For that reason it has seemed to some that simple ideas of sensation are fit to explain sensitive knowledge. Namely, Locke can combine this externalism about content with an externalism about knowledge. Simple ideas have external content in the sense that they represent their cause. Such ideas are fit for knowledge of the external world because inferences from effects to causes is of sufficient reliability to count as knowledge.

Even if one grants this interpretation of the external content of simple ideas, there are different ways of filling in the details. How the details of this content are filled in, moreover, has implications for the content of sensitive knowledge.

One possibility is that simple ideas are what M.R. Ayers calls ‘blank effects.’ The presence of a particular simple idea in your mind on a specific occasion indicates nothing but a power to produce that idea in you at that time. The causes of that idea across different occasions may have nothing in common, and may bear no similarity to one another outside of their ability to produce that idea in your mind.

A second possibility is that simple ideas represent something like their normal or designated cause. The cause may be ‘usual’ or ‘normal’ in any number of senses. It may be the cause that God has ordained for an idea. It may be the cause that most often produces the idea. It may be the cause that was naturally designed to produce the idea. Which of these readings a proponent of this interpretation adopts is not especially important for the purposes of this entry. What is important is that what is meant by the power to produce an idea in this sense is a particular kind of structure in the world.

To illustrate the difference between these interpretations consider the following comparison. Take a particular sweet taste—say, the taste of the glaze on a donut—and a particular non-sweet taste—say, the taste of Tabasco hot sauce. Now consider the effects of the so-called Miracle Berry. If one eats a miracle berry, tabasco sauce will taste like donut glaze and donut glaze will taste like Tabasco sauce. Consider this sequence.

T0: Taste some Tabasco sauce producing the simple idea of the taste of Tabasco in one’s mind.

T1: Eat a miracle berry

T2: Taste some Tabasco sauce producing the simple idea of the taste of donut glaze in one’s mind.

On blank effect readings, powers to produce simple ideas are fully perceiver-relative entities.As a result, the Tabasco sauce has two different powers at T0 and T2. At T0 it has the power to produce the idea of the taste of Tabasco. At T2, because of the effects of the miracle berry, it now has the power to produce the idea of the taste of donut glaze and no longer has the power to produce the idea of the taste of Tabasco.

By contrast, one may think that Locke’s simple ideas have some stronger, more external content. On this stronger reading the ‘power to produce an idea’ is something like the chemical structure that is the usual cause of a certain idea. On this reading, the Tabasco sauce has the same powers at T0 and T2 because it has the same chemical structure and would have the same effect on a normal perceiver.

Recent Locke scholars such as MR Ayers and Martha Bolton have paired externalism about the content of simple ideas with externalism about the knowledge such ideas allow for. On the blank effects reading, if you judge that the cause of a simple idea exists on the basis of my having that simple idea, you cannot fail to be wrong. Such judgments are perfectly reliable and therefore ought to be regarded as knowledge. If you are blindfolded, unknowingly ingest a miracle berry, sample some Tobasco sauce and then judge that you have tasted some donut glaze you are, in a sense, correct and have sensitive knowledge. You have tasted something with the power to produce the simple idea of the taste of donut glaze in you. That is all, on this view, the knowledge of the external world we have: there exist certain powers to affect our minds by producing ideas in us. On this reading we only know the world in relation to ourselves.

On the stronger, more external readings, if you judge that the cause of a simple idea exists on the basis of having that simple idea, you are normally right. According to these views, however that ‘normally’ is cashed out, it will be good enough for such beliefs to amount to knowledge even if they aren’t perfectly reliable because we can be in unusual perceptual circumstances. If you are blindfolded, unknowingly ingest a miracle berry, sample some Tobasco sauce, and then judge that you tasted some donut glaze you are wrong and do not have sensitive knowledge. You have not sampled the usual cause of that idea. When you do, however, taste some actual donut glaze and on that basis judge that there is something with the power to produce the idea of the taste of donut glaze in you, you are right and do have knowledge. This reading of Locke makes his view more similar to that of contemporary externalist epistemologies which deny that having knowledge entails that one knows that one has knowledge (the so-called KK principle). The blank-effects reading, by contrast, remains compatible with knowing that one knows.

Understanding sensitive knowledge in light of his semantics for simple ideas does not ultimately reconcile sensitive knowledge with Locke’s definition of knowledge. Rather, doing so highlights how Locke has resources from his philosophy of mind and its account of the content of thought to supplement his official definition of knowledge with a kind of reliabilism about knowledge. Approaches under this umbrella diverge in how reliable they take such judgments about the existence of the cause to be, where the reliability depends on the external content of Locke’s simple ideas.

d. Simple Ideas of Reflection and Cognitive Faculty Indicators

Some Locke scholars have attempted to reconcile Locke’s definition of knowledge with sensitive knowledge. They attempt to make sense of sensitive knowledge as the perception of agreement between ideas by finding a connection between the idea of real existence and the idea of a sensible object, such as the water fountain from section one. Interpretations developed by Newman, Allen, and Nagel attempt to draw this connection through an idea of reflection.

To understand this approach, it will be helpful to consider a part of Locke’s theory of ideas only briefly mentioned in 2.3. Recall that we receive simple ideas through two channels according to Locke’s theory of ideas: sensation and reflection. Simple ideas of sensation are produced by objects external to our mind operating on us through our senses. Ideas of reflection, by contrast, are received into the mind by a kind of inner sense—the mind’s awareness of its own activities. The aforementioned interpreters claim that ideas of reflection function as a kind of cognitive faculty indicator analogous to something like a time stamp on a video or photograph. Recording devices frequently time stamp what they record. That is, the recording produced by the device includes information about the time it was recorded. These interpretations attribute a similar view to Locke when it comes to the mental faculty by which an idea comes to be in the mind. The mind, in being aware of its activities, stamps any given idea with an idea of the faculty by which the former is produced in the mind on that occasion. This cognitive faculty indicator provides the connection between the idea of the sensible object and the idea of real existence.

According to Locke, a sensory experience of the sun is manifestly different from a memory of the sun. In fact, Locke claims that a sensory experience of the sun is as distinct from a memory of the sun as it is from a sensory experience or memory of the moon. According to those like Allen, Nagel, and Newman, Locke explains this difference as a matter of each way of thinking about the sun involving distinct ideas of reflection. Looking at the sun in the middle of a cloudless day, the idea of the sun is ‘stamped’ with the idea of actual sensation. The idea of actual sensation is an idea of reflection; an idea of the mental faculty responsible for producing the idea of the sun in the mind at that time. Later that night when remembering how the sun looked at midday, an idea of the sun is again in the mind but this time it is stamped with the idea of memory. The idea of memory is likewise an idea of reflection; an idea of the mental faculty active in producing the idea of the sun in my mind at this later time.

According to this line of interpretation, there are three ideas involved in any given instance of sensitive knowledge. First, there is the idea of the sensible object—the idea of the sun or your idea of the water fountain. Second, there is the idea of sensation. This is an idea of reflection. Third, there is the idea of real existence. The idea of sensation functions as an intermediary connecting the idea of the sensible object to the idea of real existence. The connection between the idea of sensation and the idea of real existence is supposed to be the kind of a priori connection involved in intuitive and demonstrative knowledge. If you are having a sensation then the cause of that sensation exists outside of your mind. Sensation just is being affected by the external world. Given that an idea is stamped with the reflective idea of sensation, then we can safely infer that the cause of the idea so-stamped exists outside of our mind. The connection between the idea of sensation and the idea of the sensible object is not like this—and it is not clear exactly what this relation is according to Locke (possibly co-occurrnce in the mind or some special mode of binding). The important point to note is just that the agreement between the idea of sensation and the idea of real existence is a different kind of agreement than that between the idea of sensation and the idea of the sensible object.

Interpreters disagree on what to make of this difference in the relation between the three ideas involved in sensitive knowledge. Newman suggests that the relation between the idea of actual sensation and the idea of the sensible object (the idea of the sun) only yields a probable opinion and not strict knowledge. Newman emphasizes that the involvement of probable opinion as a component of sensitive knowledge explains Locke’s claims that sensitive knowledge is the least certain of all forms of knowledge. Nagel and Allen, by contrast, hold that both the relation between the idea of actual sensation and the idea of the sensible object as well as the connection between the idea of actual sensation and the idea of real existence are knowledge conferring connections.

The textual motivation for these views comes from Locke’s exchange with Stillingfleet. In section 2.2 above, we saw that Stillingfleet pressed Locke on whether his account of knowledge could handle knowledge of the existence of the external world. Locke responded by describing the ideas perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge. It is worth considering the complete passage:

Now the two ideas that in this case are perceived to agree and do thereby produce knowledge are the idea of actual sensation (which is an action whereof I have a clear and distinct idea) and the idea of actual existence of something without me that causes that sensation. The Works of John Locke, vol. 4, p. 360.

According to these views, when Locke says that one of the ideas perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge is ‘the idea of actual sensation,’ he is naming an idea of reflection, an idea of an operation of the mind. The phrase as it appears in the passage, however, is ambiguous. Locke may be saying that one of the ideas perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge is a sensation—in Locke’s official terminology of the Essay, a simple idea received through sensation—rather than an idea of a certain operation of the mind. Indeed, Locke seems to refer back to this idea as a sensation rather than as an idea of reflection when naming the second idea perceived to agree in sensitive knowledge. He calls it an idea of something that causes ‘that sensation.’ An idea of reflection such as the idea of sensation or the idea of memory is not a sensation. Proponents and opponents of the simple idea of reflection approach give this passage and other similar passages from the Essay and Locke’s correspondence much attention.

In addition to textual worries, one might have philosophical worries about understanding sensitive knowledge as dependent on the reflective idea of sensation. Namely, it might seem to leave Locke open to obvious skeptical objections. On what grounds should we trust our cognitive faculty indicator? Just as one might doubt that a sensory idea really is produced by something external to our minds, one might worry that our ideas of reflection do not accurately track which mental faculties were responsible for producing an idea in our mind. This kind of skeptical doubt, however, is separate from the attempt to sketch how Locke’s definition of knowledge can fit with sensitive knowledge. After all, one might doubt demonstrative knowledge or intuitive knowledge as well. We will return to Locke’s replies to skepticism in section three below.

e. Sensitive Knowledge as Assurance rather than Strict Knowledge

Sam Rickless has recently advanced what he calls the assurance view of sensitive knowledge. Like the approaches discussed in 2.2 and 2.3, Rickless does not think that sensitive knowledge can be reconciled with Locke’s account of knowledge. However, Rickless argues that Locke himself did not think that sensitive knowledge was, strictly speaking, knowledge after all. As illustrated in 1.2, part of the point of Locke’s discussion of sensitive knowledge is to mark it off as distinct from other forms of knowledge. The philosophical motivation for the assurance approach lies in taking Locke’s definition of knowledge to give knowledge an a priori nature. It simply runs contrary to such a definition that we might know the existence of a contingent, finite object distinct from our minds.

The textual basis of the assurance approach lies in some of the key phrases Locke uses to describe sensitive knowledge. Locke calls sensitive knowledge a kind of ‘assurance.’ ‘Assurance’ is a term that Locke later uses in Book IV of the Essay as a name for mere probable opinion that falls short of knowledge. Similarly, Locke says that sensitive knowledge ‘passes under’ the name of knowledge rather than straightforwardly calling it knowledge. Finally, as noted above, Locke believes that sensitive knowledge is less certain that intuitive or demonstrative knowledge. It seems difficult to understand how sensitive knowledge could be less certain but nevertheless knowledge. Rickless suggests that we can make sense of the lesser certainty of sensitive knowledge by recognizing that it is not knowledge, strictly speaking, at all.

f. Analyzing Knowledge rather than Defining its Subject Matter

Another approach of note developed during the late twentieth century in the work of Ruth Mattern and then David Soles. Mattern and Soles attempt to reconcile sensitive knowledge with Locke’s definition of knowledge by developing the claim that Locke’s definition of knowledge is merely an analysis of knowledge rather than a description of the subject matter of knowledge. In other words, when Locke defines knowledge as the perception of agreement between ideas he is not claiming that knowledge is about ideas or relations between ideas. Rather, Locke’s definition of knowledge expresses what we do when we achieve knowledge about whatever subject matter we’re interested in: the existence of a thing, the relation between two mathematical objects, etc. Knowledge is grasping the truth of a proposition, seeing that a proposition is true. Locke’s definition of knowledge merely says the same using the Essay’s favored terminology of ideas.

An important consequence of this view is that it pushes back against the claim that all knowledge is of an a priori nature for Locke. His definition in and of itself merely says that knowledge is grasping the truth of a proposition. There may be many ways to ‘grasp’ or perceive the truth of a proposition that do not involve merely thinking about our own ideas. In other words, Locke’s definition leaves open the scope of our knowledge, the ways in which we can perceive any given truth. We might perceive the truth of some propositions using a priori methods, as happens in mathematics. However, there might be other ways of perceiving the truth of a proposition and so coming to knowledge.

Though both Mattern and Soles emphasize this consequence of their view, neither develops in detail how Locke might think we perceive the truth of the kinds of existential propositions known in sensitive knowledge. What sets their approach apart from those mentioned thus far, however, is that rather than try to fit sensitive knowledge to a more widely accepted understanding of Locke’s definition of knowledge, Mattern and Soles take the root of the problem of incorporating sensitive knowledge within Locke’s epistemology to lie in a widespread misunderstanding of Locke’s definition of knowledge.

g. Sensitive Knowledge and Direct Perception

Finally, John Yolton pioneered an approach to the problem of incorporating sensitive knowledge within Locke’s epistemology based on his larger project of developing an interpretation of Locke’s entire Essay as offering a direct realist theory of perception. At the core of Yolton’s view is a radical departure from Locke scholarship regarding the nature of Locke’s ideas. Ideas, according to Yolton, are acts rather than objects. On Yolton’s view, sensitive knowledge just is perceiving the agreement of an idea with a thing itself. It therefore trades on an interpretation of Locke’s definition of knowledge which is out of favor within current Locke scholarship, as noted above. Namely, that Locke’s definition of knowledge treats knowledge as the perception of agreement between an idea and some thing, not necessarily another idea. With his direct perception interpretation in the background, Yolton is positioned to say that sensitive knowledge can be a perception of agreement between an idea and a really existing thing itself. Yolton’s direct perception interpretation—if not his reading of Locke’s definition of knowledge—has been developed and defended in recent work by Tom Lennon, which will be noted in the annotated bibliography below.

3. Sensitive Knowledge and Skepticism about the External World

Section 1 explored what Locke takes knowledge of the external world to be, its content and the means by which it is achieved. Section 2 focused on the relationship between Locke’s discussion of knowledge of the external world and his broader epistemology. Knowledge of the external world, however, is often best known for its perplexing relationship with skepticism. This section will explore Locke’s attitude towards and arguments against skepticism.

Locke himself is well aware of skeptical worries about the external world. Each time he brings up sensitive knowledge in the Essay, he follows his introduction of the topic with a discussion of skeptical worries. This section will explore three threads in Locke’s response to the skeptic. First, we will consider what Locke calls ‘concurring reasons.’ These are reasons that Locke takes to support sensitive knowledge, though it appears that he does not think any ordinary instances of sensitive knowledge are based on these reasons. Second, Locke believes that sensitive knowledge is not susceptible to practical doubt. Even if one says that one doubts that the external world exists, sensory experience unfailingly guides human actions. That is, no one can act as if they doubted what their senses tell them about the external world. Third, Locke seems to think that the skeptic, at least in her stronger forms, is self-undermining.

a. The Concurrent Reasons with Sensitive Knowledge

Locke notes that in addition to knowing the existence of a thing when we see it, we have four ‘concurrent reasons’ that further support sensitive knowledge. Some of these reasons commonly crop up in discussions of skepticism in the early modern period from Descartes to Hume.

The first reason that Locke offers is that sensations depend on having senses. People without the requisite sensory organs fail to have the relevant ideas. Merely having the organs isn’t sufficient for having the ideas—a person with eyes sees no colors in the dark. So, it would seem that an external object to the senses is necessary for sensations.

To a skeptic, this is not likely to be especially convincing. After all, the skeptic doubts the very basis of claims that we have sensory organs or that sensory organs themselves are not sufficient for sensations—sense-based observations. Locke’s point here presupposes the veracity of observations of sensory organs and instances of failing to have certain ideas in certain external world conditions.

The second reason Locke offers as concurrent with sensitive knowledge is that sensations are manifestly different than other forms of thought, such as memory or imagination. As we saw above in section 2.4, Locke takes a memory of the sun to be as different from a sensory experience of the sun as a memory of the moon. One way that Locke makes this point vivid concerns our passivity in sensory experience. We can neither produce a sensory experience at will nor prevent ourselves from having a sensory experience at will. When you look up the hall with open eyes it is not up to you whether you see a crimson water fountain. Your mind is simply acted upon. By contrast, we do often exercise voluntary control over memories. We recall previous thoughts and experiences and create new things in thought at will.

A skeptic could, of course, question the force of this reason. The skeptic may point out that we could be passive in sensory experience in our dreams and hallucinations, or because we are disembodied brains in vats. Indeed, the skeptic may insist, we may be wholly non-physical minds subject to the whims of a malicious demon. Nevertheless, even if our passivity with respect to sensation doesn’t prove that the external world exists, Locke may offer it as at least a point that can be built on as part of an argument that the best explanation of our sensory experience is an external world.

The third concurrent reason Locke offers concerns the special connection between sensory experience and pleasure and pain. Locke points out that pleasure and pain are uniquely connected to sensory experience. Remembering the warmth of the sun doesn’t bring the same pleasure as basking in it. Remembering the burn of the fire doesn’t bring the same pain as did reaching in to save a child’s cherished toy accidentally flung into the flames. The value of this reply and its more precise argument against the skeptic will be explored below in section 3.2.

The final, and fourth concurrent reason Locke offers is a very familiar one. Our senses, Locke points out, tend to confirm and mutually support one another. We can touch what we see to verify that what we see really exists. Again, this sort of consideration is not on its own decisive against a skeptic. After all, a malicious demon could arrange the same sort of consistency. However, this kind of consideration can be regarded as a concurrent reason to our sensitive knowledge insofar as the mutual support of our senses is a point that can be part of a larger case in favor of the existence of an external world. Perhaps the best explanation—if not the only possible explanation—of both our passivity and the coherence of our sensations is that an external world is the cause of them.

One of the most interesting aspects of Locke’s concurrent reasons, however, is that they are offered by Locke as reasons supporting the truth of the content sensitive knowledge. That raises a question about sensitive knowledge itself. Does Locke think that instances of sensitive knowledge themselves rest on any reasons? Do we infer the existence of some thing distinct from our minds on the basis of some premise concerning the ideas we have at the time? If Locke does think that sensitive knowledge is based on some reasons, he never clearly articulates what those reasons are or how they are acquired. Perhaps, then, sensitive knowledge is non-inferential and not based on any reasons. Shelley Weinberg has developed an account of sensitive knowledge as non-inferential. Indeed, a non-inferential view of sensitive knowledge seems to fit neatly with the contrast observed in section one above which Locke draws between sensitive and demonstrative knowledge. Demonstrative knowledge, recall, is knowledge achieved by reasoning from premises.

A consequence of taking sensitive knowledge to be non-inferential is that the skeptic cannot be proven wrong—we cannot prove the existence of an external world even if we know it to exist in sensitive knowledge. These concurrent reasons at best make it probable that the external world exists. The concurrent reasons Locke offers, then, are not intended to provide a decisive defeat of the skeptic as part of a proof of the external world. Instead, they provide what Locke takes to be the strongest rational support possible.

b. Skepticism and Practical Doubt

In addition to emphasizing the special connection between sensory experience, on the one hand, and pleasure and pain, on the other, Locke repeatedly remarks that skepticism can be cured by fire. Locke writes:

For he that sees a candle burning, and hath experimented the force of its flame by putting his finger in it will little doubt that this is something existing without him which does him harm and puts him to great pain: which is assurance enough when no man requires greater certainty to govern his actions by that what is as certain as his actions themselves. And if our dreamer pleases to try, whether the glowing heat of a glass furnace be barely a wandering imagination in a drowsy man’s fancy by putting his hand into it he may perhaps be wakened into a certainty greater than he could wish that it is something more than bare imagination. E IV.xi.8.

Locke’s point in this and similar passages seems to be that the deliverances of our sense are connected with pleasure and pain in such a way as to make it impossible to doubt our senses for the purposes of guiding our actions. A skeptic, for example, may deny that the glass furnace exists, but if she sticks her hand into the furnace she will irresistibly act on the deliverances of her senses. She will move her hand away from where she perceives the furnace to be, betraying that she in fact accepts what her senses tell her about the world. For the purposes of guiding her action, then, even the skeptic takes the deliverances of her senses to be real.

How strong this serves as a rejoinder to the skeptic is not immediately clear. The skeptic may reply that though they are compelled to act in certain cases this doesn’t mean that they genuinely accept the deliverances of the senses. Or, perhaps more strongly, the skeptic may reply that though they are compelled to assent to what the senses convey, such assent is not rational or reasonable. It is more like a reflex than an action.

Jennifer Nagel has argued that Locke anticipates this kind of response from the skeptic. Locke, according to Nagel, argues that all it is to treat something as really existing is to treat it as action guiding. Locke, in other words, might be taken to collapse the distinction between real existence and real for practical purposes of guiding our action with respect to pleasure and pain. This move by Locke taps into one of Locke’s earliest diagnoses of skepticism: it is rooted in an excessive demand on our rational faculties that derives from insufficient appreciation of the purpose of our faculties.

The purpose of our cognitive faculties, Locke suggests in the Essay’s introduction, is to secure happiness both in this world and beyond. Insofar as our senses provide a guide to securing pleasures and avoiding pains, the senses fulfill their purposes and achieve all the knowledge we can reasonably hope for. A skeptic, then, who hopes for more knowledge over and above guidance with respect to pleasure and pain simply demands too much. Even the skeptic can’t practically deny that our senses do give us knowledge of how to guide our actions with respect to pleasure and pain. That is all there is to knowledge of real existence.

Ultimately, a reply to skepticism based on collapsing real existence with action guidance is only as strong as that collapse. Any form of skepticism that takes knowledge of real existence to be more than knowledge of how to pursue pleasure and avoid pain will remain unmoved. Locke’s view could be more convincing if it were accompanied by a defense of his views about the purpose of our cognitive faculties.

c. Skepticism as Self-Undermining

A final line of response to skepticism can be found in Locke’s discussion of sensitive knowledge. When Locke mentions skeptical worries he tends to dismiss them as unworthy of—or possibly as themselves ruling out—serious response. Here are two examples:

If anyone say a dream may do the same thing and all these ideas may be produced in us without any external objects he may please to dream that I make him this answer, 1. that ’tis no great matter whether I remove his scruple or no: where all is but dream, reasoning and arguments are of no use, truth and knowledge nothing… E IV.ii.14

For I think nobody can, in earnest, be so skeptical, as to be uncertain of the existence of those things which he sees and feels. At least, he that can doubt so far, (whatever he may have with his own Thoughts) will never have any controversy with me; since he can never be sure I say anything contrary to his opinion. E IV.xi.3

Locke seems to suggest in these passages that the skeptic is in some way self-undermining. In raising the possibilities they do, they somehow undermine the ability to even coherently talk about knowledge of the external world. Keith Allen has recently developed an argument that connects the account of sensitive knowledge as a perception of agreement between ideas, discussed in section 2.4 above, with this line of anti-skeptical response.

Section 2.4 considered an approach to reconciling Locke’s definition of knowledge with sensitive knowledge through Locke’s category of ideas of reflection. According to this approach, all of our ideas are stamped with an idea of reflection that tells us which of our mental faculties was responsible for producing the idea in our minds at that time. When we have a sensory experience of some object, like the crimson water fountain in section one, our idea of that object agrees with the idea of actual sensation, which itself agrees with the idea of real existence.

As Locke understands the kinds of skeptical doubts in the above mentioned passages, skepticism amounts to doubting the veracity of our ideas of reflection. That is, radical skepticism amounts to doubting that when an idea of a crimson water fountain is stamped with the idea of actual sensation, the idea of the crimson water fountain really is received through sensation. Instead, the idea might be produced in the mind by the mind itself recalling or imagining the idea (unbeknownst to itself). Ideas of reflection provide us with our only way of understanding our mind, however. We have no access to our minds or their activities other than through ideas of reflection. To doubt the veracity of an idea of reflection is therefore to doubt the very possibility of even talking about activities of the mind like knowledge. In doubting whether our ideas of reflection really do tell us about the activities of the mind, then, the skeptic renders useless all talk of knowledge whatsoever.

When Locke says that it matters not whether he replies to the skeptic, Allen argues, he is pointing out this way in which the skeptic’s argument is self-undermining. The skeptic’s goal is to challenge whether we have the knowledge we take ourselves to have. In raising the doubts that they do, however, the skeptic undermines their ability to talk about knowledge at all. Without being able to talk about knowledge the skeptic renders the very doubts they raise about knowledge empty and meaningless.

The force of this response depends on the strength of the skepticism confronted. This reply is only addressed at the most radical of skeptics—the kind of skeptic who challenges that the reflective idea of sensation tells us anything at all about the means by which an idea was produced in the mind. Such a skeptic doubts even the connection between a mind and its thought. A less radical skeptic may simply suggest that on any given particular occasion in which you think you have sensitive knowledge, you do not. A moderate skeptic of this kind would simply note that the reflective idea of sensation is not infallible, it is at best reliable. There are occasions, then, when an idea of a sensible object is stamped with a reflective idea of sensation but the idea of the sensible object is not in fact produced in the mind via sensation. This more moderate worry does not threaten to completely undermine our ability to understand our own minds via ideas of reflection but it does seem to undermine any given instance of sensitive knowledge. There need be no difference in terms of the ideas in your mind when you look up the hall and see a crimson water fountain and when you hallucinate one. Generally, it’s true, the latter will not be stamped with a reflective idea of sensation but on occasion it can be. So far as is possible to tell from one’s own subjective perspective, any given instance of sensitive knowledge might be one of the mistaken cases. Thus, though we cannot be generally mistaken about the existence of the external world we can be mistaken in any particular case.

d. Themes in Locke’s Responses to Skepticism

A theme that emerges from Locke anti-skeptical arguments is the way in which Locke’s account of what it is to have knowledge of the external world comes apart from how skeptical worries are to be engaged. Individuals can have sensitive knowledge even if they can’t draw on the lines of argument Locke himself develops in the Essay. Indeed, in no case is skepticism refuted, or proved wrong. Rather, the skeptic is pushed back with arguments that support a probable opinion that skepticism is mistaken. Locke makes this point explicit when it comes to his ‘concurrent reasons.’ They are reasons both independent of our sensitive knowledge as well as not capable of proving the skeptic wrong. Locke’s other lines of anti-skeptical argument carry the same theme.

Locke’s point that the skeptic can’t doubt their senses in practice emphasizes that even someone committed to skeptical doubts has sensitive knowledge. The force of this response, however, rests on claims about the fundamental nature and purpose of our cognitive faculties that seem beyond the scope of knowledge. Finally, the claim that the radical skeptic is self-undermining likewise divorces the having of sensitive knowledge from anti-skeptical argument. Even the radical skeptic, on this argument, is not so much refuted through a reductio ad absurdum argument as she is set aside as incoherent or not worth serious engagement.

A second theme in Locke’s anti-skeptical argument is that his primary emphasis is merely on the externality or distinctness from our mind of sensible objects. The skeptic Locke engages in the pages of the Essay is one who suggests that what seem to be sensory experiences are in fact nothing but the product of our own mind as a kind of dreaming or mere imaginations. So, even if Locke succeeds in rebuffing the worry that the mind itself is responsible for its sensory experiences, it is not clear how far that takes him against other nearby worries.

For example, Locke’s replies to the skeptic seem to leave us well short of knowing even that there is a distinctly physical as opposed to merely external world. To appreciate this issue and the fine line Locke attempts to draw, consider three claims that Locke holds. First, we cannot know the fundamental nature of any kind of thing, even the nature of our own minds. Second, we know the existence of things distinct from our minds. Third, we know the existence of physical objects (bodies) through sensation. These three claims encapsulate Locke’s rejection of a Cartesian account of the world and our knowledge of it. On a Cartesian view, not only do we know the existence of an external world but we also know its fundamental nature. Locke accepts, nevertheless, that we know bodies to exist distinct form our own minds as thinking things. The difficulty of making sense of Locke’s view can be highlighted by considering Locke’s position vis-a-vis idealist metaphysics. It is not clear, for example, how or whether the position Locke stakes out in holding these three claims is incompatible with an idealist metaphysics—such as Berkeley’s—that gives particular physical objects an existence external to and independent of any particular finite mind. Descartes’ position, on the other hand, stands in clear contrast with the metaphysics of Berkeley. Thus, though Locke’s reply to the skeptic may carry weight against someone who denies there is an external world, it is more difficult to understand how Locke can claim that we know physical objects to exist. Satisfactorily addressing this question for Locke takes us beyond the scope of this entry and into untangling the relationships between what Locke calls nominal essences, real essences, and substance.

4. Conclusion

Locke’s discussion of knowledge of the external world brings us to confront many of the central themes in Locke’s philosophy. Locke thinks of knowledge of the external world as sensitive knowledge of real existence. That is, it is knowledge that some object exists distinct from our mind and affects our mind by producing certain ideas in it. This knowledge is achieved through sensory experience. It is neither the result of reflecting on ideas already in our mind nor of deductively reasoning from some premises.

Integrating sensitive knowledge with Locke’s broader epistemology is no easy task. Locke’s definition of knowledge appears to make all knowledge a priori, but knowledge of the external world is patently not a priori knowledge like knowledge of mathematical truths—even by Locke’s own lights. It is empirical knowledge gained through experience. Locke nevertheless insists that we have sensitive knowledge. Efforts to understand the place of sensitive knowledge in Locke’s epistemology as a whole lead to probing not only important questions about his definition of knowledge—such as whether it really does make all knowledge a priori—but also his philosophy of mind and accounts of representation and mental content. Indeed, efforts on these issues have led to very radical rethinks of Locke’s entire philosophy such as Yolton’s effort to understand Locke’s theory of perception in direct perception terms.

Finally, Locke’s account of sensitive knowledge is intimately related to but significantly distinct from his reply to skepticism. Locke does not think that particular instances of sensitive knowledge—such as when you know that the paper (or screen) you’re reading from exists—depend on being able to defeat skeptical doubts. Indeed, Locke does not seem to think that the skeptic can be fully defeated or demonstratively proved wrong. Rather, skeptical worries can be pushed back using the probable arguments embodied in Locke’s concurrent reasons with sensitive knowledge. Our passivity in sensation and the coherence of our sensation seem to call out for explanation. The best explanation, Locke seems to think even though he does not explicitly argue the point, is the existence of an external world. Locke rejects other forms of skepticism as either grounded on unacceptable assumptions or else as containing the seeds of their own incoherence. Ultimately none of Locke’s anti-skeptical arguments are likely to convince a dug-in skeptic. But in this failure, Locke is surely not alone, even among other canonical figures in the history of philosophy.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Texts

Locke, John. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (ed. Peter Nidditch). Oxford University Press, 1975.
- This is the standard scholarly edition of the Essay. It includes an editorial system to note revisions made to the Essay from the first through sixth editions of the Essay as well as references to the translation of the Essay into French by Pierre Coste.
Locke, John. The Works of John Locke (ed. Thomas Tegg), 1823.
- The collection is contained in nine volumes and includes Locke’s writings and correspondence on many topics, from philosophy, to economics, to religion. Most relevant to this entry, Locke’s correspondence with Stillingfleet is in the fourth volume.

b. Secondary Literature

Entries are organized by topic, including the context of their mention in this entry.

i. Sensitive Knowledge as Incompatible with Locke’s Definition of Knowledge

Woolhouse, Roger. ‘Locke’s theory of knowledge,’ The Cambridge Companion to Locke, ed. Vere Chappell, p. 146-171. Cambridge University Press, 1994.
- This is a very accessible entry on Locke’s epistemology. Woolhouse spends time in the entry developing the distinct incompatibility between sensitive knowledge and the definition of knowledge.
Jolley, Nicholas. Locke. Oxford University Press, 1999.
- Jolley’s book is a short, easily approachable introduction to the whole of Locke’s thought. In the book Jolley not only develops an argument that sensitive knowledge is incompatible with Locke’s theory of knowledge but the broader point that the epistemology Locke develops in Book IV of the Essay is incompatible with the empiricist philosophy of mind and language developed in the first three books of the Essay.

ii. Sensitive Knowledge and the Semantics of Ideas

Ayers, Michael. Locke: Epistemology and Ontology. Routledge. 1993
- Ayers’ book is one of the most influential books in recent Locke scholarship and ranges over the whole of Locke’s metaphysics and epistemology. In many places Ayers attempts to draw connections between Locke’s views and current views and issues in philosophy. It is a near must-read for anyone interested in Locke’s theoretical philosophy. It also contains the formation of the blank effect view of the semantics of simple ideas and an explanation of how the blank effect view could help to make sense of Locke’s claims about sensitive knowledge.
Bolton, Martha. ‘Locke on the Semantic and Epistemic Role of Simple Ideas of Sensation,’ Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 85, Issue 3, p. 301-321. 2004.
- Bolton’s article is a very clear development of the connection between the epistemic and semantic features of simple ideas of sensation mentioned in section 2.3. She also directly engages and discusses the ‘blank effect’ view from Ayers.
Ott, Walter. ‘What is Locke’s theory of representation?’ British Journal for the History of Philosophy, Vol. 20, Issue 6, p.1077-1095. 2012.
- Ott is a leading scholar on Locke’s theory of representation in both mind and language. This 2012 piece is a nice high level introduction to the issues surrounding Locke’s theory of representation and spells out in detail some of the possible ways of understanding externalist content for Locke’s ideas.

iii. Sensitive Knowledge as an Agreement between Ideas

Allen, Keith. ‘Locke and Sensitive Knowledge,’ Journal of the History of Philosophy, Vol. 51, Issue 2, p.249-266. 2013.
- Allen’s article is notable not only for its clear account of the way in which sensitive knowledge can be made compatible with Locke’s definition of knowledge but also for its very in-depth discussion of how that account of knowledge supplies Locke with a powerful response to the radical skeptic.
Nagel, Jennifer. ‘Sensitive Knowledge: Locke on Skepticism and Sensation.’
- Nagel’s article has been in circulation online for some time. After developing an account of sensitive knowledge similar to Allen’s, Nagel provides an in-depth account of how Locke develops the point that the skeptic cannot doubt her senses in practice. Nagel also provides useful historical context as to why Locke would’ve thought such a response to the skeptic powerful in light of the kind of skepticism that was popular in the late 17th century.
Newman, Lex. ‘Locke on Sensitive Knowledge and the Veil of Perception—Four Misconceptions,’ Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 85, Issue 3, 273-300. 2004.
- Newman’s article on sensitive knowledge is a careful and methodical look at how sensitive knowledge is compatible not only with Locke’s definition of knowledge but also with attributing to Locke a representational (rather than direct) theory of perception. Newman’s article also contains very detailed argument in favor of the ‘between-ideas’ formulation of Locke’s definition of knowledge mentioned above in section 2.1.
Newman, Lex. ‘Locke on Knowledge,’ The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s ‘Essay Concerning Human Understanding,’ ed. Lex Newman, 313-351. Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- Newman’s general article on knowledge is very accessible entry point into Locke’s broader epistemology. It concludes with a shorter more easily digested presentation of the view of sensitive knowledge developed in the 2004 paper above.

iv. Locke and Direct Perception

Yolton, John. Locke and the Compass of Human Understanding. Cambridge University Press, 1970.
- Yolton’s book contains some of the earliest and clearest attempts to develop a direct perception interpretation of the Essay. Yolton also in this book develops the interpretation of Locke’s definition of knowledge as an agreement between an idea and some thing else, not necessarily an idea. Putting these two points together, Yolton argues that sensitive knowledge neatly fits within Locke’s definition of knowledge
Lennon, Thomas. ‘Through a Glass Darkly: More on Locke’s Logic of Ideas,’ Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 85, Issue 3, p. 301-321. 2004.
Lennon, Thomas. ‘The Logic of Ideas and the Logic of Things: A Reply to Chappell,’ Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 85, Issue 3, p. 356-360. 2004.
Lennon, Thomas. ‘Locke on Ideas and Representation,’ the Cambridge Companion to Locke’s ‘Essay Concerning Human Understanding,’ ed. Lex Newman, 231-257. Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- All three of these articles by Lennon develop in great detail both the textual and philosophical cases for a direct perception interpretation of Locke’s theory of ideas. The 2007 article from the Cambridge Companion is the most accessible of the bunch and takes on some of the most straightforward objections to the theory.

v. Sensitive Knowledge as Assurance

Rickless, Samuel. ‘Is Locke’s Theory of Knowledge Inconsistent?’ Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, Vol. 7, Issue 1, p. 83-104. 2008.
Rickless, Samuel. ‘Locke’s “Sensitive knowledge”: Knowledge or Assurance?’ Oxford Studies in Early Modern Philosophy, Vol. 7. Forthcoming.
- Rickless’ articles provide a sustained, thorough, and creative argument for the claim that Locke does not really think that sensitive knowledge is a kind of knowledge. Rickless provides both textual and philosophical motivation for his interpretation. The second, forthcoming article addresses some of the criticisms that have been made of his view by Allen, Nagel, and Owen.
Owen, David. ‘Locke on Sensitive Knowledge.’
- This is an unpublished manuscript from David Owen, a leading scholar in early modern philosophy. This article is an accessible argument against Rickless’ assurance interpretation.

vi. Locke’s Account of Knowledge as an Analysis

Mattern, Ruth. ‘Locke: “Our Knowledge, Which All Consists in Propositions”.’ Canadian Journal of Philosophy, Vol 8, 677-695. 1978. Reprinted in Locke, ed. Vere Chappell, p. 266-241. Oxford University Press, 1998.
- Mattern’s article marks an important first attempt to understand Locke’s definition as compatible with sensitive knowledge on the grounds that the definition of knowledge is just a statement that knowledge is grasping the truth of a proposition in the Essay’s terminology of ideas.
Soles, David. ‘Locke on Knowledge and Propositions,’ Philosophical Topics, Vol. 13, Issue 2, p.19-29. 1985.
Soles, David. ‘Locke’s Empiricism and the Postulation of Unobservables,’ Journal of the History of Philosophy, Vol. 23, Issue 3, p. 339-369. 1985.
- Both of Soles’ articles, but especially the first listed above, very clearly articulate the difference between offering an analysis of knowledge and defining knowledge by describing the subject matter of knowledge. Soles clearly articulates the distinction and how understanding Locke’s definition of knowledge as an analysis makes it clearly compatible with sensitive knowledge.

vii. Sensitive Knowledge and Skepticism

Weinberg, Shelley. ‘Locke’s Reply to the Skeptic,’ Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 94, Issue 3, p.389-420. 2013.
- Weinberg’s article develops the distinct way in which sensitive knowledge is non-inferential. In light of the non-inferentiality of sensitive knowledge, Weinberg goes on to discuss the lines of response open to Locke.

viii. Further Reading

For those with further interests in the topics of Locke on perception or sensitive knowledge, it is worth reading a special issue of Pacific Philosophical Quarterly edited by Vere Chappell on the topic of Locke’s veil of perception. Several entries above are from this edition—Volume 85, Issue 3. What year? In addition to the entries listed above, there is an introduction to the volume and commentary on each article from Vere Chappell.

Bolton, Martha, ‘The Taxonomy of Ideas in Locke’s Essay,’ The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s ‘Essay Concerning Human Understanding,’ ed. Lex Newman, 67-100. Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- An accessible general introduction to Locke’s theory of ideas. In the discussion of Locke’s account of the representational content of ideas, it was noted that Locke takes modes and relations to be mind-dependent. For more on the difference between simple ideas and substances ideas, on the one hand, and ideas of modes and relations on the other, it is helpful to look at Locke’s discussion of what he calls the reality, adequacy, and truth of ideas.
Stuart, Matthew. Locke’s Metaphysics. Oxford University Press, 2013.
- For those interested in more on Locke’s metaphysics, including the mind-dependence of modes and relations, a recent work with an exceptional ability to bring contemporary analytical tools to Locke’s philosophy.
Newman, Lex (editor). The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s ‘Essay Concerning Human Understanding.’ Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- A broad look at several topics in Locke’s theoretical philosophy, including several articles relevant to Locke’s discussion of nominal essence, real essence, and substance. Thearticles by Ed McCann, Margaret Atherton, Michael Losonsky and Lisa Downing are especially relevant to questions of the way in which Locke can make sense of the claim that there is a physical world external to and distinct from our minds.

Author Information

Matthew Priselac
Email: mdpriselac@ou.edu
University of Oklahoma
U. S. A.

Henry David Thoreau (1817–1862)

The American author Henry David Thoreau is best known for his magnum opus Walden, or Life in the Woods (1854); second to this in popularity is his essay, “Resistance to Civil Government” (1849), which was later republished posthumously as “Civil Disobedience” (1866). His fame largely rests on his role as a literary figure exploring the wilds of the natural world, not as a philosopher.

Thoreau gravitated toward Stoic philosophy, Hindu and Buddhist insights, and European idealism and romanticism; he was an eclectic thinker weaving together various philosophies to formulate his own unique strain of American thought.

This article helps readers understand Thoreau’s philosophical inclinations and his contributions to American philosophy that allow him to stand as an early innovator of American thought and literature, and it does so based on Thoreau’s concept of wildness and his penchant to preserve wildness in all he encountered.

Thoreau’s emphasis on the individual’s encounter with wildness oriented his outlook on authorship and philosophy, education, ontology, religion, ethics, and politics. The following sections of this article will show this through evidence provided in Thoreau’s literary and personal writings: his essays, books, journal entries, and letters.

In the twenty-first century, scholars have begun to take Thoreau more seriously as a philosopher. In The Senses of Walden, Stanley Cavell addresses Thoreau as an analyst of language who works against skeptical foundations. Cavell’s engagement associates Thoreau with other philosophers of language, such as Ludwig Wittgenstein and J. L. Austin. Alfred I. Tauber focuses on Thoreau as a moral thinker, and the essays in Thoreau’s Importance for Philosophy address Thoreau’s aesthetics, environmental ethics, ideas on embodiment, moral epistemology, political ideas, and Stoic affinities. A similar philosophical emphasis can be found in The Concord Saunter, a peer-reviewed journal dedicated to the study of Thoreau’s life and texts; an example is Edward F. Mooney’s article examining Thoreau’s wild ethics, which concludes with a summary of Thoreau’s ethics of care, or more accurately, Thoreau’s preservative care for all that is wild.

In the end, this emphasis on a more philosophical Thoreau makes sense. Because of Harvard College’s reliance on John Locke’s empirical philosophy, Thoreau extensively examined Locke’s Essay on Human Understanding, and he had to study the Scottish Common Sense philosophy of Thomas Reid and Dugald Stewart. As a Transcendentalist and through his friendships with thinkers steeped in German thought, Thoreau became acquainted with German philosophers and literary figures, such as Johann Gottlieb Fichte, Johan Wolfgang von Goethe, Immanuel Kant, G. W. F. Hegel, and Friedrich von Schlegel. Finally, in Thoreau’s library one could find various philosophical texts: Thomas Brown’s Philosophy of the Human Mind, William Paley’s The Principles of Moral and Political Philosophy, Dugald Stewart’s Elements of the Philosophy of the Human Mind, and books on Nyāya and Sāṅkhya philosophies (leading schools in Hindu philosophy). Immersion in philosophy, therefore, was a crucial part of Thoreau’s development as an American thinker and writer.

Biographical Information
Subjectivity, Philosophy, and Writing
Education and Uncommon Sense
Nature and Ontology
Religion and the Wild
An Ethic of Preservative Care
Disobedient Politics
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biographical Information

Thoreau was born in Concord, Massachusetts to a close-knit family. Within his house were his mother, father, two sisters, and brother. To help supplement their income, the Thoreau family took in boarders, and Thoreau helped out at his father’s pencil factory. Outside of brief excursions, most of Thoreau’s life was spent in and around Concord, and with the exception of his time living at Ralph Waldo Emerson’s house and in New York City as a tutor, Thoreau remained at home until his death at the age of forty-four from tuberculosis.

He was born during a period of rapid changes in the United States. Thoreau lived during the early phases of the American Industrial Revolution and the rise of populous textile mills at the confluence of the Concord and Merrimack rivers and up and down the Merrimack River; he lived during the rise of the telegraph; he lived during the time of westward expansion, the California gold rush, the Mexican-American War, and staunch resistance to slavery from the abolitionists. While all these play an important role in his texts, Thoreau chose the railroad as an enigmatic presence and force in New England.

The railroad was extending across the United States, and its whistle penetrated the recesses of the woods around Concord. In Walden, Thoreau writes, “The whistle of the locomotive penetrates my woods summer and winter, sounding like the scream of a hawk sailing over some farmer’s yard, informing me that many restless city merchants are arriving within the circle of the town, or adventurous country traders from the other side” (115). In A Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers (1849), Thoreau describes a similar phenomenon, but with more emphasis on the railroad’s undesirable effects on the natural world: “Instead of the scream of a fish-hawk scaring the fishes, is heard the whistle of the steam-engine arousing a country to its progress” (87). The train explicitly represents great power, technological innovation, the rule of commerce, and cultural progress, but it also carries the connotation of the displacement of animals, the destruction of the natural world, and the pernicious powers of the market. For Thoreau, therefore, “progress” was an ambiguous term; while the majority of Americans could honor this word, Thoreau recognized the constraints of capitalist democracy, and he was concerned about where a market-based culture was going to lead the nation and just how harmful “progress” could be.

He saw the unfavorable consequences of the market not only in the natural world, but the changes in human communities, and the diminishment of life worried him.

Most men, even in this comparatively free country, through mere ignorance and mistake, are so occupied with the factitious cares and superfluously coarse labors of life that its finer fruits cannot be plucked by them. Their fingers, from excessive toil, are too clumsy and tremble too much for that. Actually, the laboring man has not leisure for a true integrity day by day; he cannot afford to sustain the manliest relations to men; his labor would be depreciated in the market. He has no time to be anything but a machine. (Thoreau 6)

America’s market society was generating a level of artificiality in life and cultivating a desire for the accumulation of goods. A consumer society is based on the ability to create a desire for new products; to maintain this high level of dependence on material goods, people have to work more. These artificial cares, or desires for unneeded goods, diminished the time available for rejuvenating activities and quality interpersonal relations. In a society of technological advancement and the increased use of machines, human beings were beginning to become more mechanized. They were machines guided by the timetable of the market and robotic laborers doing unsatisfying jobs.

To counteract this dehumanizing process, Thoreau chose to make his life an example of simple living and his writings fruits of his countercultural lifestyle. Within this context, he is probably best known for his experiment at Walden Pond. This was his personal declaration of independence. Obtaining approval from Emerson to build a cabin on Emerson’s land, Thoreau built a ten-by-fifteen-foot cabin on the shores of Walden Pond. For two years, two months, and two days from July 4, 1845 to September 6, 1847, Thoreau dedicated his life to frugality and writing the only two books published during his lifetime: A Week and Walden. His townspeople persistently inquired why he chose to live aloof from society, and Thoreau gave his answer in a famous passage in the second chapter of Walden: “I went to the woods because I wished to live deliberately, to front only the essential facts of life, and see if I could not learn what it had to teach, and not, when I came to die, discover that I had not lived. I did not wish to live what was not life, living is so dear, nor did I wish to practice resignation, unless it was quite necessary. I wanted to live deep and suck out all the marrow of life . . .” (90-91). He partially withdrew from society, so he could experience life more directly, being able to confront it on its simplest terms. In doing so, Thoreau wanted to “suck out all the marrow of life,” which means he sought to ingest the vitality at the core of life itself—as “marrow” signified the best aspect of an entity. His withdrawal, then, concerned living more fully and as simply as possible.

Despite his serious efforts to be an accomplished writer, Thoreau’s writings, generally, were not warmly received. In 1849, he had to publish A Week with his own money, and Thoreau remained in debt to the publisher for several years. Walden, which was published in 1854, was more warmly received, but generally throughout his life, people did not see Thoreau as an accomplished author. It was not until years later, around the beginning of the twentieth century, when people started to appreciate Thoreau more, and Houghton Mifflin Co. helped to solidify his reputation in 1906 when the company published his books, essays, and journals, which totaled twenty volumes. Since 1906, Thoreau’s reputation as a literary figure has grown, and he has become an important intellectual figure for environmental movements.

The Transcendentalist movement, which was an intellectual, social, and religious movement of loosely gathered, like-minded individuals in and around Boston and Concord, helped to cultivate Thoreau’s intellectual pursuits. During his years at Harvard College, Thoreau had read Emerson’s Nature (1836), which he withdrew from the library on two occasions; Emerson’s book was one of the earliest expressions of New England Transcendentalism. Around the time of his graduation from college, he became better acquainted with Emerson personally, and they developed a type of mentoring friendship. While their relationship would decrease in intimacy and fondness later in life, the early support and inspiration Thoreau received from Emerson was crucial for Thoreau’s development as a writer. He had lived with Emerson from 1841 to 1843, for example, and this provided Thoreau with an environment that nurtured his writing and gave him the opportunity to interact intimately with Emerson’s wife and children. While serving as a handyman, Thoreau had access to Emerson’s library and Emerson’s supportive company, which sustained Thoreau’s hopes for authorial success.

For Thoreau, however, life and literature were not two distinct realms; in fact, he was accustomed to a way of seeing the world that merged different areas of study. He was comfortable with transgressing intellectual boundaries; this is seen most clearly, for example, in his study of the natural world. Thoreau was a land surveyor; in fact, he was one of the most accurate and trusted surveyors in, and around, the Concord area. He was accustomed to spending time outdoors, which was largely a daily routine and constituted hours of his day. Thoreau was fond of the natural world; arguably, one could see it as a type of romantic or friendly fondness. He studied nature intensively, such as documenting the date that specific flowers bloomed, the rise and fall of water levels, and the dispersion patterns of seeds.

At the time, this scientific outlook was called natural philosophy, and Thoreau often identified himself as a natural philosopher. This passion of his, however, went much deeper than science; he saw nature as an important part of the human context, so to study nature was to study humanity, too. This was not the only leap he would take to cross disciplinary boundaries. Math and poetry could be linked, nature and literature could be linked, and so could religion and politics. The important point for understanding Thoreau, then, is that study of all kinds should be integrated and assist pupils in living a freer, more responsible life marked by the quality, not the quantity, of life.

Outside of Walden, Thoreau is known best for his essay “Civil Disobedience.” This essay began as a lecture given on January 26 and February 16, 1848, and the original title was “The Rights and Duties of the Individual in Relation to Government.” When the essay was published in a journal called Aesthetic Papers in May 1849, Thoreau changed the title to “Resistance to Civil Government,” but it was not until 1866, four years after Thoreau’s death, that the essay would receive the new title of “Civil Disobedience.” This essay, arguably, provides one of the best starting points for Thoreau’s political philosophy and the best place to begin reading his other reform writings.

“Civil Disobedience” is also important, however, because it has played an important role in Thoreau’s global influence. While Thoreau’s influence on Mohandas Karamchand Gandhi is exaggerated at times, it is clear that Thoreau’s essay and other writings provided Gandhi with a strategic advantage because of Thoreau’s place in American literature and because of Thoreau’s admiration for Hindu philosophy. Thoreau’s influence proceeded from Gandhi to Martin Luther King, Jr.; through his reading of Gandhi, King encountered Thoreau as a political ally for the struggle for liberation from segregation and racism. Today, Thoreau’s influence extends to environmentalism and struggles for human rights within the U.S. and beyond.

2. Subjectivity, Philosophy, and Writing

A common description of Thoreau emphasizes his ardent individuality. One quote used to justify this comes from the concluding chapter of Walden: “If a man does not keep pace with his companions, perhaps it is because he hears a different drummer. Let him step to the music which he hears, however measured or far away” (Thoreau 326). But such descriptions need be tempered by his fondness for communion with others, which is clearly seen in how he furnished his cabin while residing at Walden Pond: “I think that I love society as much as most, and am ready enough to fasten myself like a bloodsucker for the time to any full-blooded man that comes in my way. I am naturally no hermit . . . I had three chairs in my house; one for solitude, two for friendship, three for society” (Thoreau 140). When we think of Thoreau, then, it should be with an awareness to both aspects, that is, his ability to march out of step with the rest of society and the satisfaction he gained from being with others. Any approach to his philosophy merits a balanced awareness of these dimensions. In the end, Thoreau wrote his philosophy from the subjective position, but he composed his works to transform and edify others, too.

From Thoreau’s perspective, it is naïve to think that any composition comes from a purely objective position; no author can ever remove the I from her or his work. Thoreau describes the dependence on the I in the second paragraph of Walden:

In most books, the I, or first person, is omitted; in this it will be retained; that, in respect to egotism, is the main difference. We commonly do not remember that it is, after all, always the first person that is speaking. I should not talk so much about myself if there were any body else whom I knew as well. Unfortunately, I am confined to this theme by the narrowness of my experience. (3)

While there have been thinkers who have wanted to escape the confines of the human being as a contextualized, limited animal, what we could associate with Thomas Nagel’s view from nowhere, Thoreau rejects a desire for complete objectivity. Yes, there is an external world that impinges on our senses, that poses limits, and may prove false our misguided conclusions and assumptions, but all experience is the experience of someone from a particular time and location.

This means that philosophy will never be objective; it will always carry within it the authorial I and the author’s prejudices, desires, and expectations. If we focus closely on the above passage, it also is clear that our experiences are quite limited; while we may know ourselves best, Thoreau never asserts that we know ourselves completely. Human endeavors, including philosophy, will be marked by incompleteness, which is a lack of intimacy with all that the world has to offer and a lack of intimacy with our own inner world, too. With every text, authors provide readers with only one perspective from within an infinite array of other possible angles.

Thoreau’s emphasis on infinite possibilities is not hyperbole. He bases this ability to divide perspectives infinitely on mathematical insights. Between any two points on a number line, for example, an infinite division is possible. The subjective view admits of infinite divisions; we can change our views by altering our relations with objects. Honoring perspectival shifts in A Week, Thoreau esteems what he calls “a separate intention of the eye.” Looking at the calm water’s surface as he and his brother float on the Concord River, Thoreau offers the following observation: “Wherever the trees and skies are reflected there is more than Atlantic depth, and no danger of fancy running aground. We noticed that it required a separate intention of the eye, a more free and abstracted vision, to see the reflected trees and the sky, than to see the river bottom merely; and so are there manifold visions in the direction of every object . . .” (48). Depending on how you approach any object and the emphases you select, or what separate intention of the eye you deploy, it is possible to encounter any object infinitely and to reposition it within its eternal relations (359).

This is why Thoreau values uncommon sense over common sense. Along with his emphasis on the perspectival nature of observations and writing, Thoreau’s reverence for uncommon sense is crucial to understanding his role as a philosopher and author. There are two passages in A Week emphasizing the tension between common and uncommon sense. He writes,

I perceive in the common train of my thoughts a natural and uninterrupted sequence, each implying the next, or, if interruption occurs it is occasioned by a new object being presented to my senses. But a steep, and sudden, and by these means unaccountable transition, is that from a comparatively narrow and partial, what is called common sense view of things, to an infinitely expanded and liberating one, from seeing things as men describe them, to seeing them as men cannot describe them. This implies a sense which is not common, but rare in the wisest man’s experience; which is sensible or sentient of more than common. (386)

In a passage on the following page, Thoreau writes, “What is called common sense is excellent in its department, and as invaluable as the virtue of conformity in the army and navy,–for there must be subordination,–but uncommon sense, that sense which is common only to the wisest, is as much more excellent as it is more rare” (387). Thoreau is directing the reader’s attention to experiences of liberation from the common ways of receiving, describing, and explaining the world. For Thoreau, humans become molded by customs and habits that affect our sensations, thoughts, and actions. He is not content with these common ways and wants to break free from them; being able to come to a rare angle of vision is not only liberating, but it is one of the elements of being wise.

As a philosopher and author, therefore, Thoreau is not satisfied with supposed objective writing. He encourages readers to experience the world and life through the first person, singular I, and he advocates freeing oneself from the commonplace thoughts and interpretations of life. He wants readers to explore life from many angles. While this honors the individual and her or his emplacement in a specific context, Thoreau wants people to transcend those constraints to experience the novelty and natural regenerative forces found in every context. This is arguably one of the most important reasons for writing, namely, the text’s potential to liberate readers. Thoreau writes,

Enough has been said in these days of the charm of fluent writing. We hear it complained of some works of genius, that they have fine thoughts, but are irregular and have no flow . . . We should consider that the flow of thought is more like a tidal wave than a prone river . . . The reader who expects to float down stream for the whole voyage, may well complain of nauseating swells and choppings of the sea when his frail shore-craft gets amidst the billows of the ocean stream . . . But if we would appreciate the flow that is in these books, we must expect to feel it rise from the page like an exhalation, and wash away our critical brains like burr millstones, flowing to higher levels above and behind ourselves. (A Week 102-03)

As a philosopher, then, Thoreau does not imagine his role as a comforter, nor does he imagine his role as a person who maintains the stability of society; his role, not dissimilar to Socrates’ role, is one of disturber and nonconformist, as he stands aloof from the state and the constraining elements of society. His essays and books, therefore, serve as an outlet for his short-circuiting thoughts: “Books, not which afford us a cowering enjoyment, but in which each thought is of unusual daring; such as an idle man cannot read, and a timid one would not be entertained by, which even make us dangerous to existing institutions,–such call I good books” (A Week 96). To be a self implies a level of disobedience, and this same disobedience will be found in the author’s works.

3. Education and Uncommon Sense

Thoreau was known for his ability to teach, to inspire students, and to foster creativity; and he was known for his practice of leaving the classroom to take his students on walks and exploring the woods with them. He resisted many commonplace educational practices; the most important example is his dislike for corporal punishment. Thoreau resisted its use in the burgeoning public school system of Concord, and he eventually left his post because he could not approve of attempts to make him do otherwise. This distaste for corporal punishment was part of a larger distrust of popular views of education in general; he had been educated in a system that emphasized rote learning. His educational values and distrust for standard educational practices, however, harmonized with those of his Transcendentalist friends; one of the recurring themes in Transcendentalism, for example, is how to improve education, its creative potential, and its ability to transform society. From within this context, Thoreau esteemed education as a freeing activity and as an integral part of the social fabric.

A common motif in Thoreau’s work is the unexpected; he esteems novel insights or fresh ways of seeing. On May 30, 1853, Thoreau wrote the following words in his journal: “That which had seemed a rigid wall of vast thickness unexpectedly proves a thin and undulating drapery. The boundaries of the actual are no more fixed and rigid than the elasticity of our imaginations. The fact that a rare and beautiful flower which we never saw, perhaps never heard [of], for which therefore there was no place in our thoughts, may at length be found in our immediate neighborhood, is very suggestive” (Journal 5 203-04). This passage returns to the tension between common and uncommon sense; for Thoreau, there is an attraction to seeing things in an uncommon way, encounters with the world that reveal how porous and flexible our understanding of the world should be. Instead of education being a way to train students through rote learning and rigid constructs, Thoreau envisioned education as being more about provocation, imagination, and freeing students to experience moments of insight more frequently. Education, therefore, had an element of cultivating a sensibility for the unforeseen, for the wild.

In a similar approach to his outlook on authorship, Thoreau understood education as a highly personal experience with transformative qualities. He esteems the subjective element in learning.

There is no such thing as purely objective observation. Your observation, to be interesting, i.e. to be significant, must be subjective. The sum of what the writer of whatever class has to report is simply some human experience, whether he be poet or philosopher or man of science. The man of most science is the man most alive, whose life is the greatest event. Senses that take cognizance of outward things merely are of no avail. It matters not where or how far you travel,—the farther commonly the worse,—but how much alive you are. (Journal 6 236-38)

The duality between objective and subjective observation has important implications for education. First, it means that education is not based on the model of a phlegmatic observer who is separate from that which is being observed; instead, observation and learning emerge from a life lived with intensity and subjective concerns. Secondly, the intensity of one’s life conditions one’s ability to look at the world in a more fruitful way; to live more freely and in a way not restrained by restrictive customs and habits will lead to greater appreciation for the unexpected in life, which keeps the senses attuned to the external world and its wildness. The terminus, however, is the integration of the external world with one’s internal world; eventually, all the data will take on the personal qualities of the observer, which leaves education a highly subjective act fully merged with daily life within specific contexts.

Thoreau offers a type of education that should aspire to a level of wildness or should be a little uncivilized. Not only is education stultifying for students who are forced to take part in rote learning, but pedantic teachers also cultivate a way of engaging life and studies that is constraining. In his journal, Thoreau explains, “Scholars have for the most part a diseased way of looking at the world. They mean by it a few cities and importunate assemblies of men and women—who might all be concealed in the grass of the prairie” (Journal 2 69). The overly pedantic learning of scholars is “diseased,” as it takes a very partial or narrow view of what counts for life, who counts as a person, and what locations are significant for human life. The end of Thoreau’s entry reintroduces the tension between civilization and the wilds of the natural world: “They describe their world as old or new—healthy or diseased—according to the state of their libraries—a little dust more or less on their shelves. When I go abroad from under this shingle or slate roof—I find several things which they have not considered—their conclusions seem imperfect.” Scholars remain content with the knowledge in their libraries and do not seek other forms of experience or fresh insights. Thoreau reuses the word “diseased” to emphasize a faculty not functioning at its healthiest capacity; unlike these scholars, however, Thoreau moves beyond the construction of the house and ventures into the world beyond books and libraries. It is beyond the bookish space of the scholar that he finds things that undo their arguments; they have come to the wrong conclusions; their encyclopedic knowledge is unsound.

To be an educator, a student, or a scholar means more than understanding the common sense of other writers; true education and learning exceed the encyclopedic knowledge of a community. Sitting in the same room or at the same desk day after day is an ineffective way to cultivate knowledge. Contrary to the cultivation of facts and the short time devoted to education in life, education is a life-long process for Thoreau that, ideally, should inform the community’s ethos, turning all members of society into a team of mutually-supportive learners or a culture based on continuing education.

We boast that we belong to the nineteenth century and are making the most rapid strides of any nation. But consider how little this village does for its own culture . . . We need to be provoked,—goaded like oxen, as we are, into a trot. We have a comparatively decent system of common schools, schools for infants only . . . and latterly the puny beginning of a library suggested by the state, no school for ourselves . . . It is time that we had uncommon schools, that we did not leave off our education when we begin to be men and women. It is time that villages were universities, and their elder inhabitants the fellows of universities, with leisure—if they are indeed so well off—to pursue liberal studies the rest of their lives. (Walden 108-09)

In this passage, which is as much a criticism of local and state practices as much as a comment on education, Thoreau advocates a communal emphasis and pride of place for education and schools. It is not enough to educate people for part of their lives; instead, education should be a continuous process throughout our lives. Against simple factual acquisition, early childhood education only, the devaluation of the schools, and a lack of funding, Thoreau paints a picture of education that is freeing, dynamic, done in shifting contexts, and invaluable to the health of society. Education should prepare us for engaging life in fresh ways and experiencing the flux that constitutes all existence.

4. Nature and Ontology

Thoreau was an ardent lover of all things “natural”; contrary to caricatures of him, he was not so enamored with nature that he only saw its “positive” aspects. In fact, he came to understand quite well how diverse and complex the natural world is. It is accurate to say that he saw the beauty of nature and its life-giving potential, and this led him to reimagine who the human being is. In his essay “Walking” (1862), Thoreau addresses his desire for being more connected with the natural world: “I wish to speak a word for Nature, for absolute Freedom and Wildness, as contrasted with a Freedom and Culture merely civil,—to regard man as an inhabitant, or a part and parcel of Nature, rather than a member of society” (Excursions 185). Instead of ignoring the natural world, Thoreau wants to honor its importance, but he makes it clear that it is through nature and in nature that humanity is more than it is in civil society. In other words, society constructs a reductive image of humans as outside of nature and separate from it, but this is a dehumanizing process, as being fully human is realizing how we are part of the natural environment everywhere surrounding, embracing, penetrating, and integrating us.

This does not mean, however, that the natural world takes notice of humanity. Thoreau knew that the natural world provides humans with needed materials to survive, but just as much as it helps us to survive, it also can be violent and indifferent to humanity’s welfare. In Cape Cod (1865), Thoreau describes the tendency nature has of “wasting no thought on man.”

The sea-shore is a sort of neutral ground, a most advantageous point from which to contemplate this world . . . The waves forever rolling to the land are too far-travelled and untamable to be familiar . . . . It is a wild, rank place, and there is no flattery in it. Strewn with crabs, horse-shoes, and razor-clams, and whatever the sea casts up,—a vast morgue, where famished dogs may range in packs, and crows come daily to glean the pittance which the tide leaves them. The carcasses of men and beasts together lie stately up upon its shelf, rotting and bleaching in the sun and waves, and each tide turns them in their beds and tucks fresh sand under them. There is naked Nature,—inhumanly sincere, wasting no thought on man, nibbling at the cliffy shore where gulls wheel amid the spray. (147)

The ocean can be beautiful, but here Thoreau describes the very inhumane sincerity that gives the ocean its character. As much as the water supports a lively world below its surface, it harbors within it dead, decaying bodies that find little rest among the nonstop agitations and undulations of the waves.

While the popular perception of Thoreau can focus on his desire to preserve nature, its beauty, and its inspiring qualities, Thoreau does not ignore the potential danger that constitutes a great portion of nature. The ocean could carry commerce and people from continent to continent, but it could also toss boats around, sink them, and drown their passengers. Thoreau, therefore, was not blind to the immense power and dangers of nature, and he knew well the fear this could generate.

Based on his travels to Maine, Thoreau’s The Maine Woods (1864) provides startling accounts of the natural world and its relation with humans. One of the best-known passages concerns Thoreau’s ascent and descent of Mt. Ktaadn, which stands 5,269 feet high and is located almost in the center of Maine. Thoreau was not ready for the feeling of dislocation he would be subjected to as he crossed a rugged, lightning-charred portion of the mountain; being outside of commonly-encountered surroundings and traversing the harsh portion of Ktaadn, Thoreau explains,

Perhaps I most fully realized that this was primeval, untamed, and forever untameable Nature, or whatever else men call it, while coming down this part of the mountain. We were passing over Burnt Lands, burnt by lightning . . . It is difficult to conceive of a region uninhabited by man. We habitually presume his presence and influence everywhere. And yet we have not seen pure Nature, unless we have seen her thus vast, and drear, and inhuman, though in the midst of cities. Nature was here something savage and awful, though beautiful . . . I stand in awe of my body, this matter to which I am bound has become so strange to me. I fear not spirits, ghosts, of which I am one,—that my body might,—but I fear bodies, I tremble to meet them. What is this Titan that has possession of me. Talk of mysteries!—Think of our life in nature,—daily to be shown matter, to come in contact with it,—rocks, trees, wind on our cheeks! The solid earth! The actual world! The common sense! Contact! Contact! Who are we? Where are we? (69-71)

Here Thoreau becomes dispossessed of the familiarity he has felt in nature; the starkness of the landscape and the raw materiality of the mountain thrust his own materiality into question, which generates a desire for material contact. He moves from the land that is inhuman to his need for contact; he has encountered a part of nature that does not make him feel at home, but has reduced him to feeling less than himself, or other than himself. His materiality has become fleetingly insignificant in the face of the extremeness of the mountain’s overwhelming, non-comforting charred rockiness.

Nature is complex and without a consistent fond engagement with human life. At moments, it can be home and friend, a place for journeys and discoveries; at other times, it can be a threat to life, a brutal reminder of humanity’s dependence and finitude. To appreciate Thoreau’s outlook on the natural world, then, readers need to be aware of these disparate qualities of the natural world.

Despite this ambiguity concerning the character of the natural world, Thoreau’s writings continuously return to water for context and as a metaphor structuring his ontological outlook. From his earliest journal entries to his last years of journaling, the focus on water is prevalent. This emphasis is most evident in the final years of his life when he logged detailed data in his journals concerning the variations of water levels of the Concord River throughout the seasons. Similarly, the two books published during his life, A Week and Walden, are based on the importance of a source of water for the setting; in A Week, the setting is the Concord and Merrimack rivers, and in Walden, it is Walden Pond. In his two posthumously published books, The Maine Woods and Cape Cod, Thoreau is dependent on water, as it is inseparable from the overall progression of his writings; in The Maine Woods, for example, Thoreau travels by water from the Penobscot River and Chamberlain Lake to Moosehead Lake, and Cape Cod remains largely focused on the Atlantic Ocean and its impact on Cape Cod and its inhabitants.

Sherman Paul makes this clear in his book on Thoreau; he addresses the deep spiritual and ontological significance of water for Thoreau.

[There was] something irresistible in water for Thoreau, that something so spiritually akin to him that he felt himself called to it ‘by a natural impulse’ . . . the constant lure was the quest for a reality that had been encrusted by time and landed conventions, a reality to be regained by experience outside of time—that is, by immersion in its flux . . . The river had become the way of communion with the eternal. (199)

Thoreau makes water’s significance quite clear at the beginning of A Week when he focuses on rivers as highways and their constant ability to lure people into the deep recesses of uncharted territories: “Rivers must have been the guides which conducted the footsteps of the first travellers. They are the constant lure, when they flow by our doors, to distant enterprise and adventure, and, by a natural impulse, the dwellers of their banks will at length accompany their currents to the lowlands of the globe, or explore at their invitation the interior of continents. They are the natural highways of all nations . . .” (12). Human life and water are inseparable; water sustains life, travel, and the imagination.

Thoreau uses water for more than his settings, however, as he constructs his ontology on the flowing nature of water and the belief that change is a constant part of existence. Thoreau is comfortable with how all aspects of the world are changing; he made this discovery toward the end of his boating voyage with his brother, as he describes the flowing nature of all existence:

. . . all things seemed with us to flow; the shore itself, and the distant cliffs, were dissolved by the undiluted air. The hardest material seemed to obey the same law with the most fluid, and so indeed in the long run it does. Trees were but rivers of sap and woody fibre, flowing from the atmosphere, and emptying into the earth by their trunks, as their roots flowed upward to the surface. And in the heavens there were rivers of stars, and milky-ways, already beginning to gleam and ripple over our heads. There were rivers of rock on the surface of the earth, and rivers of ore in its bowels, and our thoughts flowed and circulated, and this portion of time was but the current of the hour. (A Week 244)

Instead of allowing readers to think that returning to land would be the halting point for encountering flows, Thoreau honors the changes going on below our feet and all around us. Instead of stability, there is flux everywhere, and this challenges our desires for permanence.

In a more famous passage from Walden, Thoreau brings the Earth’s alterations into the foreground.

Few phenomena gave me more delight than to observe the forms which thawing sand and clay assume in flowing down the sides of a deep cut on the railroad through which I passed on my way to the village, a phenomenon not very common on so large a scale . . . When the frost comes out in the spring, and even in a thawing day in the winter, the sand begins to flow down the slopes like lava, sometimes bursting out through the snow and overflowing it where no sand was to be seen before . . . . I am affected as if in a peculiar sense I stood in the laboratory of the Artists who made the world and me,—had come to where he was still at work . . . I feel as if I were nearer to the vitals of the globe . . . . What is man but a mass of thawing clay? . . . . Thus it seemed that this one hillside illustrated the principle of all the operations of Nature . . . It convinces me that Earth is still in her swaddling clothes, and stretches forth babe fingers on every side. (304-08)

This thawing, which is taking place around the railroad tracks, is a small portion of what is occurring on a larger scale. The flow of the sand and clay reminds Thoreau of the flowing taking place within the human body, and it convinces him that Earth is still in a process of changing and maturing. This is Thoreau’s “ontology of flows,” or his belief that the nature of being is in a constant state of perpetual flux. It is philosophically incorrect to emphasize permanence or stagnation over change.

This view of the natural world has serious implications for Thoreau’s outlook on life and interactions with others. Societal structures like to keep things orderly, and societies like to categorize aspects of the world and rank them according to which aspects are extremely valuable compared to those things that are insignificant. This is what Thoreau identifies as the “civilizing processes” in American society. He links this with domestication, taming, and scripted hospitality. These attempts to constrain people oppose the natural flows constituting all existence, so Thoreau pursues a process of “becoming feral.” He wants to become uncivilized, untamed, or wild.

He needs the natural world and its wildness to keep him healthy, and Thoreau is often quite condemnatory concerning the effects society has on humans, which is present as early as his “Natural History of Massachusetts” (1842):

In society you will not find health, but in nature. Unless our feet at least stood in the midst of nature, all our faces would be pale and livid. Society is always diseased, and the best is the most so. There is no scent in it so wholesome as that of the pines, nor any fragrance so penetrating and restorative as the life-everlasting in high pastures . . . The doctrines of despair, of spiritual or political tyranny or servitude, were never taught by such as shared the serenity of nature. (Excursions 5)

Despite the potential dangers found in the natural world, there is a rejuvenating element that restores the person to health and maintains a more agreeable perspective on life. To be trapped indoors and in the grips of customs and habits is anathema to Thoreau; he sought the healthy, resilient fluctuations of the natural world until he was bedridden in the last days of his life because of tuberculosis. The wildness of creation always called to him.

5. Religion and the Wild

Thoreau has been quite influential in environmentalist circles. His unwavering respect for the natural world and its processes is part of a lineage of ecological concern in the United States. Beyond his emphasis on the scientific and aesthetic sides of the natural world, however, Thoreau also honored the religious or spiritual dimensions of the environment. He did so with a pluralistic penchant that allowed him to remain open to religious insights across traditions, such as Buddhism, Hinduism, and Native American teachings.

In contemporary academic parlance, Thoreau integrated these outlooks into a position classified as “nature religion” or “deep green religion” by Catherine L. Albanese and Bron Taylor, respectively. Taylor comments on Thoreau’s importance within this realm:

Henry David Thoreau is often regarded as a patron saint for such spirituality in America, casting a long shadow and influencing virtually all of the twentieth-century’s most important environmentalist thinkers, including John Muir, John Burroughs, Aldo Leopold, Rachel Carson, Wendell Berry, Edward Abbey, Gary Snyder, and James Lovelock. Indeed, both Thoreau and these progeny have assumed iconic status within the pantheon of saints favored among those who participate in contemporary nature religion. (“From the Ground Up” 91)

Nature religion is “a type of religion in which nature is the milieu of the sacred, and within which the idea of transcendence of nature is unimportant or irrelevant to religious practice” (Davy 1175), and Taylor asserts that dark green religion means “religion that considers nature to be sacred, imbued with intrinsic value, and worthy of reverent care” (Dark Green Religion ix). Thoreau’s naturalistic orientation, therefore, is actually highly religious in nature, and this aspect of his thought places religion beyond the constraints of an institution and places religion beyond the walls of human structures. In fact, Thoreau’s religious perspective perpetuates the motif of wildness, a becoming feral in matters of religion.

Thoreau’s unique religious outlook developed in opposition to New England’s Christian traditions. He found conservative and liberal Christianities to be irreligious; instead of honoring creation, they profaned it. New England’s Christianity was too doctrinaire, and in its rigidity, it established supposed truths that were anything but certain for Thoreau, and they also helped to create a boundary between people. In the end, he was uncomfortable with dogmatic certainty.

Most people with whom I talk, men and women even of some originality and genius, have their scheme of the universe all cut and dried,–very dry, I assure you, to hear, dry enough to burn, dry-rotted and powder-post, methinks,–which they set up between you and them in the shortest intercourse; an ancient and tottering frame with all its boards blown off . . . Some to me seemingly very unimportant and unsubstantial things and relations, are for them everlastingly settled,–as Father, Son, and Holy Ghost, and the like. These are like the everlasting hills to them. But in all my wanderings, I never came across that least vestige of authority for these things. They have not left so distinct a trace as the delicate flower of a remote geological period on the coal in my grate. The wisest man preaches no doctrines; he has no scheme; he sees no rafter, not even a cobweb, against the heavens. It is clear sky. (A Week 69-70)

Here Thoreau offers disparaging comments against such religious doctrines as the Trinity; instead of turning to the Bible for the veracity of such doctrines, Thoreau turns to his experiences within the natural world. As he sauntered in the natural world in Massachusetts and beyond, Thoreau found nothing to justify the Trinity and other outlooks that others believed to be accurate understandings of Earth and the universe. Quite the contrary was true; instead of opening up the complexity of the universe and life, such doctrines actually exclude the richness of life and creation. Instead of allowing for intimate encounters, religious and nonreligious dogmas actually prevent more authentic relationships from growing.

One of the common ways of thinking about the natural world during Thoreau’s time was to depict it as God’s creation, and nature pointed back toward God as though the natural world were language with God as the author. This is found in Emerson’s first book, Nature (1836): “We can foresee God in the coarse, and, as it were, distant phenomena of matter . . . the noblest ministry of nature is to stand as the apparition of God. It is the organ through which the universal spirit speaks to the individual, and strives to lead back the individual to it” (Essays 40). In many of his writings, Emerson provides the reader with a reverential assessment of nature, but this reverence is not for nature itself; instead, his esteem is based on nature’s ability to lead humanity to the spirit behind and emanating through the natural world.

Thoreau finds this problematic, and he will proclaim that nature itself is divine: “May we not see God? . . . Is not Nature, rightly read, that of which she is commonly taken to be the symbol?” (382). It is incorrect to think of God as somewhere beyond the natural world; for Thoreau, when we interact with and experience the natural world properly, God is present. It is no longer the symbol pointing beyond to God; the natural world is divinity itself. Thoreau’s boldest statement, however, concerns his pagan worship of the natural world: “In my Pantheon, Pan still reigns in his pristine glory . . . Pan is not dead, as was rumored . . . . Perhaps of all the gods of New England and of ancient Greece, I am most constant at his shrine” (A Week 65). Instead of being in front of altars and preachers within churches, Thoreau turns to Pan: the god most comfortable in wild places, a god who dances and is supportive of shepherds and goatherds. Thoreau links immediacy, wildness, and playfulness to his religious orientation and worship.

In his examination and criticism of some of Hinduism’s shortcomings, Thoreau announces five qualities of the divine, which he calls the “Unnamed”: buoyancy, freedom, flexibility, variety, and possibility (A Week 136). In her analysis of Thoreau’s first book, Phyllida Anne Kent explains how Thoreau’s text is an elaboration of these qualities; each chapter variously emphasizes these qualities, and this guides the structure of the book: “In composing the Week Thoreau has constructed a myth of creation which embraces and transcends all other attempts to explain the universe in mythic form . . . The central figure of Thoreau’s myth seems to be a nameless spirit of the shore which represents creative power in man and in Nature” (14). The Unnamed plays an important role. First, all creation takes part in the divine processes of creation and recreation, and this implies that we need to honor these five qualities in the natural world, in ourselves, and in all human relationships. Second, the five qualities point to an ability to resist constraints, burdens, and rigidity. Instead of drowning in the difficulties of the world, we should rise above them. Instead of being constrained, we should maintain liberty. Instead of being inflexible, we should be more pliable. Instead of being comfortable with homogeneity, we should engage heterogeneity. Instead of focusing on those things that are unquestionably possible, we should move more toward unexpected and new potentials. These five qualities are best encountered in the natural world, and the natural world reminds us of their presence within every human being.

To many, this may seem an odd religious construct, and it may seem irrelevant and without much ability to shape or engage the world. The opposite is true, however, as this religious orientation has serious consequences for Thoreau’s outlook on ethics and politics. What takes shape in Thoreau’s writings is a concern for preserving these qualities in all he encounters. From friendships and his relationship with nature to his criticisms of society and slavery, it is clear that Thoreau’s guiding focus is on how to maintain the divine, wild qualities and how to resist those elements of society that try to constrain them or destroy them. It is from within this religious context that he develops an ethic of preservative care and a political outlook focused on a higher law, both trying to maintain the five qualities of the Unnamed. This religious perspective, therefore, is inseparable from his ethical and political concerns.

6. An Ethic of Preservative Care

A brief reading of Thoreau’s comments leaves readers initially uncertain about his ethical position. For example, he unambiguously offers a pseudo-hedonistic sentiment in “Natural History of Massachusetts”: “Surely joy is the condition of life” (Excursions 5). In his first letter to his friend Harrison G. O. Blake in 1848, Thoreau offers the following advice clearly limiting the extent and importance of morality: “Do not be too moral. You may cheat yourself out of much life so. Aim above morality. Be not simply good—be good for something.—All fables indeed have their morals, but the innocent enjoy the story” (Correspondence, Volume 1 362). There is something in morality, if taken too seriously, that can diminish life, which means Thoreau establishes a tension between joyous living and a purely moral life. A similar anti-moral sentiment is found in A Week that expresses the limits of one’s conscience: “The conscience really does not, and ought not to, monopolize the whole of our lives, any more than the heart or the head. It is as liable to disease as any other part” (74). Against a Kantian appraisal of morality that foregrounds the moral law in all we do, Thoreau foregrounds how life exceeds morality, a dominating conscience, and an abstract goodness divorced from content or contexts.

What we get in Walden, however, is a very pragmatic assessment for being moral, which is drawn from his well-known hesitation to eat meat: “Yet, for my part, I was never unusually squeamish; I could sometimes eat a fried rat with a good relish, if it were necessary” (217). The important part of this quotation is the final conditional pronouncement, “if it were necessary.” Cross referencing this sentence with A Week, Thoreau clearly judges the eating of animal flesh problematic: “The carcasses of some poor squirrels, however, the same that frisked so merrily in the morning, which we had skinned and embowelled for our dinner, we abandoned in disgust, with tardy humanity, as too wretched a resource for any but starving men” (224). Those who come to humanity early see that killing such animals is less than a moral necessity; it is a disgusting act. When necessity demands it, when survival is the criterion, however, the morality of eating animal flesh changes. Changing conditions may alter the ethical demands we face, so a type of situational ethics or a pragmatic moral posture appears to guide Thoreau.

A better way to frame his ethics, however, is to concentrate on the ever-changing nature of the inward condition of human beings and their dynamic relationships with the world, both human and nonhuman. As Mooney indicates, one of Thoreau’s concerns is the wildness within every human being (“Thoreau’s Wild Ethics” 107-08). In a journal entry for August 19, 1851, Thoreau writes, “The poet must be continually watching the moods of his mind as the astronomer watches the aspects of the heavens . . . A meteorological journal of the mind” (Journal 3 377). This comparison between the mind and the skies offer a clear indication of the ceaselessly changing nature of one’s emotions and fluctuating moods. Part of the ethical task is to be aware of these shifts, meteorological alterations of the mind that affect life and relationships. In other words, any ethical position that seeks to impose stability and necessity on human life will encounter problems as the internal world, like nature, is filled with fluctuations. Ethics, then, needs to take account of this wildness within, or this undomesticated nature of our inner world.

Thoreau’s emphasis on being watchful is important, for he thought too many people lived their lives in a condition of sleep. Watchfulness and reawakening oppose inattentiveness and sleep. Thoreau tells readers, “We must learn to reawaken and keep ourselves awake, not by mechanical aids, but by an infinite expectation of the dawn, which does not forsake us in our soundest sleep. I know of no more encouraging fact than the unquestionable ability of man to elevate his life by a conscious endeavor . . . To effect the quality of the day, that is the highest of arts” (Walden 90). There is a perpetual newness immanent within human life that should not go unnoticed, and to live a fuller life, it needs to be one of fighting off sleep and living awakened; this will be done with an expectation of something like the renewal of dawn in life. This means fighting the habits and customs ingrained in us by society and disengaged living; it is the struggle to bring more quality to our lives through active engagement and attention to all we encounter.

The somnolent propensities of society leave people in a zombie-like state, focused on acquisitions, and in a state of desperation. In A Week, Thoreau offers a vivid picture of this condition: “All men are partially buried in the grave of custom, and of some we see only the crown of the head above ground. Better are the physically dead, for they more lively rot. Even virtue is no longer such if it be stagnant. A man’s life should be constantly as fresh as this river. It should be the same channel, but a new water every instant” (132). The slow accumulation of custom, its rules, and expectations leave people in a process of being buried alive; this diminishes life to such a great extent, that they are neither alive nor dead. To be buried alive and constrained by society’s customs is like being in a stagnant state where change is absent or nearly absent. The best life is one that is coursing and fresh, elevating the quality of life.

To understand this orientation in his ethics, it is important to understand Thoreau’s distrust of the market economy he was living in; instead of simple living and appreciation of one’s milieu, people were enticed to live unnecessarily complicated lives focused on the acquisition of new goods. People were enticed to take on more activities and possessions than was necessary, and Thoreau openly criticizes this through his emphasis on simple living.

Simplicity, simplicity, simplicity! I say, let your affairs be as two or three, and not a hundred or a thousand; instead of a million count half a dozen, and keep your accounts on your thumb nail. In the midst of this chopping sea of civilized life, such are the clouds and storms and quicksands and thousand-and-one items to be allowed for, that a man has to live, if he would not founder and go to the bottom and not make his port at all, by dead reckoning, and he must be a great calculator indeed who succeeds. Simplify, simplify. (Walden 91)

Society is like a dangerous ocean that is likely to submerge one’s life, taking the person down to the bottom of the ocean. Part of the difficulty is being able to calculate the simplest life against the impositions of society. Not only is life about paying attention, keeping awake amid the sleep-inducing qualities of society, and allowing one’s life to remain fresh, but Thoreau makes it clear that life has to be a strategic avoidance of the enticements and dangers of society.

Instead of falling into the trap of a consumer culture and the hoarding of unneeded products, Thoreau urges people to live as simply as possible, which in his words is similar to mathematical reductions: “I do believe in simplicity. It is astonishing as well as sad, how many trivial affairs even the wisest man thinks he must attend to in a day. When a mathematician would solve a difficult problem, he first frees the equation of all encumbrances, and reduces it to its simplest terms. So simplify the problem of life, distinguish the necessary and the real” (Thoreau, Dean, and Blake 36). The crucial ethical task, the crucial part of living a quality life, is the discernment of the real and the necessary, while recognizing and avoiding what is inauthentic and unnecessary.

Mooney rightly describes this orientation as a wild ethic and an ethic of preservative care (“Thoreau’s Wild Ethics”). From his essay “Walking” comes Thoreau’s most ardent statement about preserving wildness, a wildness present in the world around us and within us: “. . . and what I have been preparing to say is, that in Wildness is the preservation of the world” (Excursions 202). This wildness is not simply the trees and untamed aspects of the forest; there is a common wildness within the natural world and humanity, and ideally, society would integrate and nurture this wildness in the community:

Life consists with Wildness. The most alive is the wildest. Not yet subdued to man, its presence refreshes him. One who pressed forward incessantly and never rested from his labors, who grew fast and made infinite demands on life, would always find himself in a new country or wilderness, and surrounded by the raw material of life. He would be climbing over the prostrate stems of primitive forest trees. (202-04)

Within each person is a force with great potential that allows for an infinite demand on life, expectations that life will continue to grow and be fresh. This wildness is not focused satisfied with how things are, letting life stagnate; as Thoreau saw it, life, the woods, and all that is worthy of respect do not settle into a state of stagnant equilibrium. Instead, as with the natural world and its flowing, human life should be flowing and changing, too.

Wildness is a characteristic that people should have within themselves, and they should preserve this wild quality in their actions, thoughts, and speech. Jane Bennett aptly summarizes this quality: “. . . the Wild, that which disturbs and confounds settled projects, techniques, and myths . . . . the Wild speaks to the idea that there always remains a surplus that escapes our categories and organizational practices, even as it is generated by them” (xxvii). In the end, Thoreau’s ethic of preservative care—preserving wildness and the wild in all we encounter—entails a countercultural propensity, a disobedient way of life.

7. Disobedient Politics

Because of Thoreau’s emphasis on wildness and his countercultural stance, writers have had a difficult time establishing where Thoreau belongs in relation to politics and other topics; his political philosophy has often fallen into contradictory categories.

In “Thoreau’s Ideas,” Walter Harding shows how variable Thoreau is and how difficult it is to categorize him; he examines this phenomenon of disparate Thoreaus as scholars have identified Thoreau as a stoic, epicurean, nature writer, ecologist, reformer, ardent supporter of abolitionism, critic of government, critic of economic systems, antisocial figure, and a person dedicated to friendship (97-138). Slight shifts of vision generate different Thoreaus; different emphases lead to different conclusions about Thoreau’s goals.

Behind this is another insight, however: Thoreau was an eclectic thinker enjoying interdisciplinary pursuits, and he followed Emerson concerning consistency. In “Self-Reliance,” Emerson proclaims, “A foolish consistency is the hobgoblin of little minds, adored by little statesmen and philosophers and divines. With consistency a great soul has simply nothing to do . . . Speak what you think now in hard words and to-morrow speak what tomorrow thinks in hard words again, though it contradict every thing you said to-day . . . To be great is to be misunderstood” (Essays 265). Thoreau’s interests, moods, and declarations about those interests and moods changed from day to day. Relating to politics, this variation has led to Thoreau the anarchist (Drinnon), Thoreau the Marxist comrade (Lynd 92-96), Thoreau as an un-Marxist thinker (Diggins), Thoreau as a comrade of Theodore W. Adorno—both examining democracy and alienation from a negative-dialectical perspective (Mariotti), Thoreau as an impotent critic of capitalism (Germic), and Thoreau as a liberation thinker (Ruehl). To appreciate why Thoreau seems uncontainable, and to appreciate his political philosophy, it is important to keep his emphasis on wildness and fluctuation in mind.

As described in the sections above, Thoreau was critical of attempts to constrain the freshness of life; he revered the processes of creation and regeneration that sustained all existence. One of the problems with society and government is that they attempt to constrain or dam the flows of life, which reduces life’s resiliency and freshness. Another serious problem, however, is that government and society do the opposite of what they are established to do; instead of protecting freedoms, democracy, and property, they imprison, dictate dogmatically, and steal:

I have not so surely foreseen that any Cossack or Chippeway would come to disturb the honest and simple commonwealth, as that some monster institution would at length embrace and crush its free members in its scaly folds; for it is not to be forgotten, that while the law holds fast the thief and murderer, it lets itself go loose. When I have not paid the tax which the State demanded for that protection which I did not want, itself has robbed me; when I have asserted the liberty it presumed to declare, itself has imprisoned me. Poor creature! If it knows no better I will not blame it. If it cannot live but by these means, I can. I do not wish, it happens, to be associated with Massachusetts, either in holding slaves or in conquering Mexico. (A Week 130)

This is a crucial passage in Thoreau’s thought for several reasons. First, it claims that the dangers do not originate beyond civil society and the state; people do not have to worry about nomadic groups or “tribal” peoples beyond the boundaries of “civilized” life. Instead, people need to fear the government, its institutions, and the willingness of citizens to support the state’s misdeeds. The commonwealth itself is the monster. Second, Thoreau is making a clear declaration that he wants to stand aloof from the state, which is the same declaration he makes in “Resistance to Civil Government”: “I simply wish to refuse allegiance to the State, to withdraw and stand aloof from it effectually . . . In fact, I quietly declare war with the State, after my fashion, though I will still make what use and get what advantage of her I can, as is usual in such cases” (Reform Papers 84). Third, the reason for distancing himself from the state is a result of the state’s corrupt nature; it uses taxes, authority, and power to maintain unjust conditions: slavery, the war with Mexico, and the decimation of Native American communities.

Thoreau, therefore, is comfortable with refusing to follow the rules of any authority, especially when that authority is oppressing another person or group. For Thoreau, the least duty we must follow is to not take part in oppression. If we have the courage and inclination, then active resistance is acceptable, too, but it is not necessary. He writes in “Civil Disobedience,”

It is not a man’s duty, as a matter of course, to devote himself to the eradication of any, even the most enormous wrong; he may still properly have other concerns to engage him; but it is his duty, at least, to wash his hands of it, and, if he gives it no thought longer, not to give it practically his support. If I devote myself to other pursuits and contemplations, I must first see, at least, that I do not pursue them sitting upon another man’s shoulders. I must get off him first, that he may purse his contemplations too. (Reform Papers 71)

Distance from the state is permissible, and avoidance of taking part in oppression is a duty. Active resistance and taking part in reform movements is an option. Life does not have to be reduced to militant activism, but we must at least make sure we neither oppress others nor contribute in any way to the oppression of others, whether through taxes, speech, or actions.

Slavery incited Thoreau to disobedience. He never joined the abolitionist movement, but he was an ardent supporter of abolition. Thoreau spoke at abolitionist rallies, even speaking at an antislavery celebration in Framingham on July 4, 1854 where William Lloyd Garrison burned the Constitution in protest. He supported John Brown, and Thoreau played a minor role in supporting the Underground Railroad, as he helped to usher slaves to safety, especially in 1851 and 1853 (Petrulionis 92-95; Richardson 249). His mother, aunts, and sisters were strong supporters of Concord’s antislavery movement, and the Thoreau family gladly took in fleeing slaves.

A friend of the family, Moncure Daniel Conway, describes the warmth of Thoreau in one of his writings concerning July 27, 1853:

I found the Thoreaus agitated by the arrival of a coloured fugitive from Virginia, who had come to their door at daybreak. Thoreau took me to a room where his excellent sister, Sophia, was ministering to the fugitive . . . I observed the tender and lowly devotion of Thoreau to the African. He now and then drew nearer to the trembling man, and with a cheerful voice bade him feel at home, and have no fear that any power should again wrong him. That whole day he mounted guard over the fugitive, for it was a slave-hunting time. (As quoted in Petrulionis 94)

Thoreau was convinced that we do not need movements, parties, and votes; what we need are people who will actively think about others and do what is best for them in every interaction.

As with the state, parties and movements can deteriorate into unthinking, dogmatic domains that impose conformity on others. When people are able to act disobediently, courageously, and in a responsible, reflective way, the state can wither away: “I heartily accept the motto,—‘That government is best which governs least;’ and I should like to see it acted up to more rapidly and systematically. Carried out, it finally amounts to this, which also I believe,—‘That government is best which governs not at all;’ and when men are prepared for it, that will be the kind of government which they hill have” (Reform Papers 63). When people finally live the lives they are created for, government will not be needed.

But what may be an even more important proclamation is the fact that one should never vote on issues of justice and injustice, but always act in support of justice no matter what the law, government, and masses say:

All voting is a sort of gaming, like chequers or backgammon, with a slight moral tinge to it, a playing with right and wrong, with moral questions; and betting naturally accompanies it . . . I cast my vote, perchance, as I think right; but I am not vitally concerned that that right should prevail. I am willing to leave it to the majority . . . Even voting for the right is doing nothing for it. It is only expressing to men feebly your desire that it should prevail. A wise man will not leave the right to the mercy of chance, nor wish it to prevail through the power of the majority. There is but little virtue in the action of masses of men. (Reforms Papers 69-70)

Consonant with the exemplary actions of his family and their ability to help people through personal contact and a strong inward devotion to what was right, Thoreau advocates a life lived well, based on justice and the courage to stand against common sense, the majority, and the state. One’s life should be the revolutionary change desired in one’s circumstances: “I think that we should be men first, and subjects afterward. It is not desirable to cultivate a respect for the law, so much as for the right . . . . Action from principle . . . changes things and relations; it is essentially revolutionary, and does not consist wholly with any thing which was” (Reform Papers 65-72). Your own life, therefore, can be the revolution.

8. Conclusion

Thoreau’s philosophy begins from an affirmative position, as he reveres, endorses, and remains faithful to wildness around and within him; his concern is to preserve wildness in his life and in every encounter. Where wildness is constrained, Thoreau wants to create the conditions for its liberation or to offer a criticism of the circumstances subjugating it. This constitutes Thoreau’s “feral philosophy,” a philosophy continuously seeking to be free from the domesticating activities of society and a philosophy seeking to liberate the rest of existence from those same domesticating activities. He intends to reframe things in fresh ways to subvert stale, common sense understandings of life and the world. Concerning this approach, Emerson offered an insightful point when he spoke at Thoreau’s funeral; to those in attendance, Emerson offered the following observation in a somewhat critical, hostile tone,

The habit of a realist to find things the reverse of their appearance inclined him to put every statement in a paradox. A certain habit of antagonism defaced his earlier writings—a trick of rhetoric not quite outgrown in his later, of substituting for the obvious word and thought its diametrical opposite. He praised wild mountains and winter forests for their domestic air, in snow and ice he would find sultriness, and commended the wilderness for resembling Rome and Paris. “It was so dry, that you might call it wet.” (“Introduction” xxvii-xxviii)

While his comment is overly reductive, simplifying Thoreau’s creativity and his writing skills too much, Emerson is on target to a certain extent; through paradox and reversals, Thoreau’s philosophy seeks to bring out the uncommon in the common. This is the approach guiding Thoreau’s philosophy, but in his deployment of it on diverse topics, Thoreau’s creativity offers startling observations and insights. His creativity, his highly refined prose, and the autobiographical origins of his writings often conceal Thoreau’s philosophical rigor; but woven throughout his texts are the concept of wildness and Thoreau’s ceaseless attempts to celebrate and elaborate what it means. From his antislavery essays to his travel narratives, wildness is the recurring philosophical theme.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Thoreau, Henry David. Cape Cod. Edited by Joseph J. Moldenhauer. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988.
Thoreau, Henry David. The Correspondence of Henry David Thoreau. Edited by Walter Harding and Carl Bode. New York: New York University Press, 1958.
Thoreau, Henry David. The Correspondence of Henry D. Thoreau, Volume 1: 1834-1848. Edited by Robert N. Hudspeth. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2013.
Thoreau, Henry David. Early Essays and Miscellanies. Edited by Joseph J. Moldenhauer, Edwin Moser and Alexander C. Kern. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1975.
Thoreau, Henry David. Excursions. Edited by Joseph J. Moldenhauer. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2007.
Thoreau, Henry David. Faith in a Seed: The Dispersion of seeds and Other Late Natural History Writings. Edited by Bradley P. Dean. Washington, DC: Island Press/Shearwater Books, 1993.
Thoreau, Henry David. The Indians of Thoreau: Selections from the Indian Notebooks. Edited by Richard F. Fleck. Albuquerque: Hummingbird Press, 1974.
Thoreau, Henry David. Journal (1837-1854). Edited by John C. Broderick, Elizabeth Hall Witherell, William L. Howarth, Robert Sattelmeyer and Thomas Blanding. Volumes 1-8. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1981.
Thoreau, Henry David. The Journal of Henry David Thoreau, 14 volumes. Edited by Bradford Torrey and Francis H. Allen. Boston: Houghton Mifflin Co, 1906.
Thoreau, Henry David. The Maine Woods. Edited by Joseph J. Moldenhauer. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
Thoreau, Henry David. Reform Papers. Edited by Wendell Glick. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1973.
Thoreau, Henry David. Walden. Edited by J. Lyndon Shanley. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
Thoreau, Henry David. A Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers. Edited by Carl F. Hoved, William L. Howarth, and Elizabeth Hall Witherell. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1980.
Thoreau, Henry David. Wild Fruits: Thoreau’s Rediscovered Last Manuscript. Edited by Bradley P. Dean. New York: W. W. Norton, 2000.
Thoreau, Henry David, Bradley P. Dean, and H. G. O. Blake. Letters to a Spiritual Seeker. New York: W.W. Norton & Co., 2004.

b. Secondary Sources

Albanese, Catherine L. Reconsidering Nature Religion. Harrisburg: Trinity Press International, 2002.
Bennett, Jane. Thoreau’s Nature: Ethics, Politics, and the Wild. Thousand Oaks: Sage Publications, 1994.
Buell, Lawrence. The Environmental Imagination: Thoreau, Nature Writing, and the Formation of American Culture. Cambridge: The Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, 1995.
Cavell, Stanley. The Senses of Walden. New York: Viking Press, 1972.
Chura, Patrick. Thoreau the Land Surveyor. Gainesville: University Press of Florida, 2010.
Davy, Barbara Jane. “Nature Religion.” In Encyclopedia of Religion and Nature, Volume II: K-Z. Edited by Bron Taylor. New York: Continuum, 2008. 1173-75.
Diggins, John P. “Thoreau, Marx, and the ‘Riddle’ of Alienation.” Social Research 39, no. 4 (1972): 571-98.
Drinnon, Richard. “Thoreau’s Politics of the Upright Man.” In Walden, Civil Disobedience, and Other Writings. Edited by William Rossi. New York: W.W. Norton and Company, 2008. 544-56.
Emerson, Ralph Waldo. Emerson: Essays and Lectures. Edited by Joel Porte. New York: Literary Classics of the United States, 1983.
Emerson, Ralph Waldo . “Introduction.” In Walden and Other Writings. Edited by Brooks Atkinson. New York: The Modern Library, 1992. xi-xxxi.
Furtak, Rick Anthony. “Thoreau’s Emotional Stoicism.” The Journal of Speculative Philosophy 17, no. 2 (2003): 122-32.
Furtak, Rick Anthony, Jonathan Ellsworth, and James D. Reid. Thoreau’s Importance for Philosophy. New York: Fordham University Press, 2012.
Germic, Stephen. “Skirting Lowell: The Exceptional Work of Nature in A Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers.” In Thoreau’s Sense of Place: Essays in American Environmental Writing. Edited by Richard J. Schneider. Iowa City: University of Iowa Press, 2000. 244-53.
Harding, Walter. The Days of Henry Thoreau: A Biography. New York: Dover Publications, Inc., 1982.
Harding, Walter . “Thoreau’s Ideas.” In Bloom’s BioCritiques: Henry David Thoreau. Edited by Harold Bloom. Philadelphia: Chelsea House Publishers, 2003. 97-138.
Harding, Walter, and Michael Meyer. The New Thoreau Handbook. New York: New York University Press, 1980.
Hodder, Alan D. Thoreau’s Ecstatic Witness. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2001.
Howe, Daniel Walker. “The Constructed Self against the State.” In Making of the American Self: Jonathan Edwards to Abraham Lincoln. New York: Oxford University Press, 1997. 235-55.
Kent, Phyllida Anne. “A Study of the Structure of Thoreau’s Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers.” Master’s Thesis, Carleton University, 1968.
Lynd, Staughton. Intellectual Origins of American Radicalism. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
Mariotti, Shannon L. Thoreau’s Democratic Withdrawal: Alienation, Participation, and Modernity. Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 2010.
Mooney, Edward F. Lost Intimacy in American Thought: Recovering Personal Philosophy from Thoreau to Cavell. New York: Continuum, 2009.
Mooney, Edward F . “Thoreau’s Wild Ethics.” The Concord Saunterer 19/20 (2011-12): 105-24.
Newman, Lance. Our Common Dwelling: Henry Thoreau, Transcendentalism and the Class Politics of Nature. New York: Palgrave Macmillan, 2008.
Paul, Sherman. The Shores of America. Urbana: University of Illinois Press, 1958.
Petrulionis, Sandra Harbert. To Set This World Right: The Antislavery Movement in Thoreau’s Concord. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2006.
Richardson, Robert D., Jr. Henry Thoreau: A Life of the Mind. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1986.
Robinson, David M. Natural Life: Thoreau’s Worldly Transcendentalism. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2004.
Ruehl, Robert Michael. “Preservative Care and Becoming Feral: Thoreau’s Religious Perspective in A Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers.” The Concord Saunterer: A Journal of Thoreau Studies 21 (2013): 77-91.
Ruehl, Robert Michael. “Thoreau’s A Week, Religion As Preservative Care: Opposing the Christian Doctrine of Discovery, Manifest Destiny, and a Religion of Subjugation.” Doctoral Dissertation, Syracuse University, 2014.
Ruehl, Robert Michael . “Thoreau as Liberation Thinker.” Thoreau Society Bulletin 284 (2014): 5.
Sattelmeyer, Robert. Thoreau’s Reading: A Study in Intellectual History with Bibliographic Catalogue. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988.
Sayre, Robert F. Thoreau and the American Indians. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1977.
Schofield, Edmund A., and Robert C. Baron, eds. Thoreau’s World and Ours: A Natural Legacy. Golden: North American Press, 1993.
Tauber, Alfred I. Henry David Thoreau and the Moral Agency of Knowing. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2001.
Taylor, Bob Pepperman. America’s Bachelor Uncle: Thoreau and the American Polity. Lawrence: University Press of Kansas, 1996.
Taylor, Bron. Dark Green Religion: Nature, Spirituality, and the Planetary Future. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2010.
Taylor, Bron. “From the Ground Up: Dark Green Religion and the Environmental Future.” In Ecology and the Environment: Perspectives from the Humanities. Edited by Donald K. Swearer. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2009. 89-101.

Author Information

Robert Michael Ruehl
Email: rruehl@sjfc.edu
St. John Fisher College
U. S. A.

Filial Obligation

The question of what one should do for one’s parents is often urgent; a parent needs care in the near future, and the grown child must decide what kind of care to provide, whether and to what extent to finance the provision of care, and to what extent the child ought to sacrifice his happiness, wellbeing, financial security, guest bedroom, and so forth for the sake of his parent. These questions are made murkier by shifting family structures, varying closeness—both past and present—between the parent and child, and conflicting obligations, such as those to one’s own children or partner or both. To make matters worse for those facing these questions, the problem is relatively new in the philosophical literature.

Despite the urgency of the problem, few philosophers have directly engaged with the question of filial obligations. Although several briefly mention this question and sketch a few initial considerations regarding it, only a handful of contemporary philosophers have attempted to articulate a theory of what one owes one’s parents. In what follows, five such theories are presented and critiqued: Debt Theory, Friendship Theory, Gratitude Theory, Special Goods Theory, and Gratitude for Special Goods Theory.

The Problem
Debt Theory
1. The View
2. Criticism
Friendship Theory
1. The View
2. Criticism
Gratitude Theory
1. The View
2. Criticism
Special Goods Theory
1. The View
2. Criticism
Gratitude for Special Goods
1. The View
2. Criticism
References and Further Reading

1. The Problem

Though the family is a well-established institution about which much has been said, the current state of the parent-child relationship is a relatively new phenomenon. First, the family structure itself has shifted so that there now exists a wide and often confusing array of family unit types. Social roles have become difficult to determine, as have the social obligations attached to and defined by those social roles. Second, life expectancy in most first world nations is considerably longer than it has been in the past, so caring for elderly parents has only recently become a long-term commitment. Third, the care required to reach, and possibly enjoy, that longer life expectancy is often expensive. Fourth, the birth rate has declined, such that each parent has, on average, fewer children to provide the necessary care than in previous times. In short, longer-living parents have fewer children who might share the increasing financial burden of caring for the aging parent for longer periods of time, and shifting family structures obscure rather than clarify the role each family member should play.

Despite its intuitive appeal, the idea that we might have special obligations to someone in virtue of our relationship with them is a philosophically problematic one. Filial obligations are a particularly puzzling subset of special obligations. If they exist, some of their likely features seem striking. For example, filial obligations are generally owed to people with whom one’s relationship is largely non-voluntary. Yet, obligations might arise from non-voluntary situations that do not involve a parent-child relationship. For instance, if you are the person uniquely situated to save the drowning toddler in the Shallow Pond example, you have a rather stringent obligation, though the relationship that has generated is non-voluntary. However, the parent-child relationship is not merely non-voluntary. Rather, for much of the relationship, voluntariness is asymmetrical; parents chose to enter into a parent-child relationship, whereas children (and presumably the drowning toddler, for that matter) did not make a similar choice. The current state of one’s relationship with one’s parents might be voluntary; the child might choose to engage (or not) with his or her parents, exchange benefits, and so forth. However, if one’s parents made tremendous sacrifices on one’s behalf, many of which one did not request and of which one was unaware, then one owes one’s parents something in response to benefits that one did not voluntarily seek and in many cases was not free to reject.

Furthermore, if we owe our parents something because they fed, clothed, and sheltered us, then it seems as though we have obligations in response to acts which were themselves morally required. Our parents are required to feed, clothe, and shelter us, at least for some time. Why would we owe anything in response? After paying taxes, we do not owe the state a “thank you” for the services it provides, nor does the state owe us a “thank you” for our tax dollars. How could moral obligations arise from provisions that are morally required of the benefactors and are not voluntarily sought or accepted by the beneficiary, particularly when the benefactors voluntarily chose to become obligated?

Moreover, filial obligations raise questions about distributive justice, both theoretical and practical. Theoretical questions arise because filial obligations seem to confer special advantages on individuals with children—or at least those concerned to fulfill such obligations—that childless individuals—or individuals with children less concerned to fulfill such obligations—do not similarly enjoy. Furthermore, these advantages compound an already existing advantage: the parent-child relationship is itself a benefit to both parties when all goes well.

Practical questions arise about how filial care ought to be distributed. Such care falls disproportionately on women, which seems to violate any reasonable demands of justice. For instance, if we consider equal opportunity as a guiding principle of justice, and filial care interferes with women’s access to and participation in the workforce, then filial care as it has been traditionally practiced violates this important demand of justice. Furthermore, insofar as women “perform the majority of housework chores and function as the primary parent for small children,” perhaps women are owed more; that is, filial obligations to one’s mother may be more extensive than those to one’s father (Jecker 2002).

2. Debt Theory

a. The View

According to Debt Theory, one owes repayment to one’s parent for whatever investment of resources the parent has made on one’s behalf, regardless of the parent’s needs or child’s ability, unless the parent releases the child from the debt. According to Debt Theory, as articulated here, children have specific obligations to their parents: they must repay their parents’ “investment” in child rearing. Parents contribute resources to raising children, including time, money, energy, and so on. Each of these resources could have been devoted to something other than raising a child. Consequently, the parent has fewer resources than he or she would otherwise have. The child therefore owes repayment of the debt.

Because this views the parent-child relationship as analogous to the creditor-debtor relationship, the circumstances under which a child would not be required to repay the investment are similar to those under which a debtor might be released from his obligation of repayment to the creditor. For example, a parent might release his child from this obligation of repayment much like a creditor might release a debtor. However, as in the case of the creditor-debtor, neither the parent’s needs nor the child’s ability determine the content of the child’s obligation. The child owes repayment regardless of his ability to repay the “loan” and regardless of whether the parent needs to be repaid. Just as the debtor’s obligation of repayment is not contingent on an ongoing, mutually beneficial relationship, the child owes repayment regardless of the nature of his relationship with his parent. Filial obligations arise from and are determined by the parent’s investment in rearing his or her child.

b. Criticism

As stated, Debt Theory is quite simple and, perhaps as a consequence of this simplicity, many critics think it is wildly implausible. Philosophers who advance a particular account of filial obligations often begin by rejecting Debt Theory. However, much of the critical discussion about it focuses on problems with an unarticulated and undefended position.

Although Confucius, Aristotle, and Thomas Aquinas each discuss filial obligations in the language of debt repayment, the view is not that children owe repayment of a “loan.” Rather, given what parents do for children, including bringing them into existence, children owe them gratitude and piety. Jan Narveson (1987) offers an account of filial morality that resembles Debt Theory, but on his view, the reason children ought to repay their parents is that it is beneficial for them to behave in ways that make parental investments rational and thereby encourage parents to make such investments. Similarly, despite “debt” language present in both Jeffrey Blustein’s Parents and Children and Philip J. Ivanhoe’s “Filial Piety as a Virtue,” both offer accounts of Debt Theory where the debt is one of gratitude or respect rather than a straightforward debt of repayment. Furthermore, Blustein suggests that those who use the “owing idiom” in fact “confuse gratitude with indebtedness” (Blustein 1982). Li (1997) has also added to these views.

In line with Blunstein and Ivanhoe’s accounts, the historical models for Debt Theory are not versions of the theory articulated here. Rather, they more closely resemble Gratitude Theory. Nonetheless, Debt Theory often serves as a useful starting point in discussions about filial obligation. Jane English, who first articulated and endorsed Friendship Theory, and Simon Keller, who did the same for Special Goods Theory, both begin by offering objections to Debt Theory. This shapes the content of their preferred theories of filial obligation. They both argue that the Debt Theory of filial obligations makes a faulty analogy between the parent-child and creditor-debtor relationships, and that this analogy ignores morally relevant features of the parent-child relationship. Despite this, critics disagree on what, if any, relationship is more closely analogous to the parent-child relationship and what that analogy, or lack thereof, implies about our filial obligations.

3. Friendship Theory

a. The View

According to Friendship Theory, children ought to do for their parents what they would do for friends with whom they share a voluntary, caring relationship. These obligations depend upon the needs and abilities of both child and parent, as well as the current state of the relationship. If the parent and child do not share a voluntary, loving relationship, then the child has no filial obligations. According to Friendship Theory founder Jane English, the entire language of the Debt Theory is problematic, as children do not, strictly speaking, owe their parents anything. The parent-child relationship is unlike the creditor-debtor relationship in that it is characterized by feelings of love and voluntary friendship.

The source of obligation between friends does not usually arise from one friend being in debt to another friend. If, for example, one friend does a favor for the other, then the beneficiary of the favor owes repayment. However, English argues that favors generate debts, but favors are fundamentally different from what friends generally do for one another. Similarly, favors are fundamentally different from most of what parents do for their children.

Unlike creditors, friends are, or ought to be, motivated by care. Indeed, we would be troubled to discover that our friends were keeping track of what nice things they had done for us and what nice things we had done for them, keeping a watchful eye out for any imbalances that might arise. According to Friendship Theory, we ought to focus not solely on the cost to the parent or on the benefit to the child, but also on the relationship in which the benefit arises. Consider a case in which a parent invests in her child’s education. If the child has asked for this payment, then the investment is a favor and the child owes repayment. If, however, the parent simply wants a good education for her child and offers to pay, then the child does not incur a debt of repayment by accepting the parent’s offer. The parent’s investment is made out of care for the child, and although the child would do well to help her parent later, the child does not owe the parent anything. Furthermore, just as we would question the friend who does nice things for us with the expectation of repayment, we might question the parent who invests in her child with an eye on repayment later. Unlike the creditor-debtor relationship, in which balance sheets are expected and appropriate, friendships are relationships where balance sheets that record kind acts would indicate the relationship’s failure. In this regard, the parent-child relationship is, or ought to be, more like a friendship than like a creditor-debtor relationship.

Returning to the case of the parent who pays for her child’s elite education, the difference between Debt Theory and Friendship Theory is clear. According to Debt Theory, the child owes repayment regardless of the parent’s financial situation. Just as a debtor owes a creditor regardless of the creditor’s financial situation, the child owes repayment for the expensive education, even if the parent’s financial investment did not constitute any significant sacrifice. On Debt Theory, if multibillionaire parents pay $200,000 for their child’s education, that child owes repayment, despite her parents’ staggering wealth. To put this in English’s own terms, if these parents do a “favor” for their child by paying $200,000, then the child owes repayment of the favor. Whether the favor constitutes a sacrifice is irrelevant in determining whether obligations arise from the favor. Yet, the degree of sacrifice might be relevant in determining the content of those obligations. Similarly, according to Debt Theory, the grown child’s abilities are irrelevant. If the child is unable to repay the parent, the child has simply defaulted on her obligations.

According to Friendship Theory, however, the multibillionaires’ child ought to be kind, express concern for, and generally continue a caring relationship with her parents, but the child need not contribute to their financial resources. For example, the child ought to call or visit her parents on their birthdays, or ensure that the relationship continues in some way. However, since her parents are financially capable of providing for their own care in old age, Friendship Theory tells us that the multibillionaires’ children do not have an obligation to provide such care. On this view, the needs, abilities, and resources of both parties shape the content of filial obligations.

According to Debt Theory, these obligations do not diminish or disappear if the parent-child relationship is terminated. The obligation of repayment might become stronger since the parent no longer enjoys benefits such as participating in the relationship, which she might have enjoyed if the relationship had continued. According to Friendship Theory, however, since the source of the obligations is not the investment but rather the relationship itself, filial obligations diminish or disappear if the relationship diminishes or disappears. To maintain that filial obligations exist without a voluntary, loving parent-child relationship is to ignore morally relevant differences between what the parent does for her child and what the creditor does for the debtor. Appropriately, the creditor acts with the expectation of repayment. The parent does not, or at least should not, act with this expectation.

b. Criticism

Two types of criticism arise in response to Friendship Theory. First, critics argue that focusing on the current state of a relationship to determine whether filial obligations arise makes those obligations too easily avoidable, thereby licensing filial ingratitude. Second, as with Debt Theory, the relationship analogy fails. Just as the parent-child relationship is different from the creditor-debtor relationship in morally significant ways, it also differs from friendships in morally significant ways.

The first type of objection challenges English’s claim that filial obligations diminish or disappear entirely when the relationship dissolves. Consequently, critics argue, filial obligations are too easily avoidable, and cases of filial ingratitude appear unproblematic. In his criticism of Friendship Theory, Simon Keller (2007) presents this objection as follows: “You cannot explain your failure to look after your parents by saying, ‘Look, they’re great people, and I’ll always value the times when we were close, but over the years we’ve taken different paths. I went my way, they went theirs, it seemed like the relationship wasn’t taking us where we wanted to go . . . things just aren’t the way they were.’ You are stuck with your filial duties, in a way that you are not stuck with your duties of friendship”. Although English embraces this conclusion, and argues that repayment after the relationship ends might indicate a lack of respect for the relationship, her critics find it a compelling reason to reject the entire model.

As stated, the second objection is that the parent-child relationship is different from a friendship in morally significant ways, and thus a theory of obligations between friends cannot serve as a theory of filial obligations. According to Joseph Kupfer (1990), not only is it unlikely that parents and children can be friends, it is undesirable. Parents and children cannot be friends because they are not equals within the relationship and they lack sufficient independence from one another to become equals. This lack is not, however, a problematic feature of the parent-child relationship. Rather, it is constitutive of a healthy parent-child relationship. Thus, rather than a friendship, the parent-child relationship is, or at least begins as, a relationship between unequal partners since parents shape who the child will become.

This history of unequal autonomy effectively eliminates any possibility that equality will be restored later in the relationship; that is, inequality begets further inequality. This is accomplished in two ways. First, the child’s self-concept is shaped by her history of unequal autonomy. Thus, the child’s self-concept is likely to include diminished autonomy with respect to the parent-child relationship. Second, the child’s history with her parent forms habits of deference and respect toward the parent. Just as the friend who has less autonomy in the context of the friendship, the grown child is less likely to make decisions, offer opinions, or resist the conclusions of the more autonomous partner in the relationship. Given this history, and the likely effect it has on the prospects for equal autonomy in the future, Kupfer concludes that parents and children cannot and should not be friends. Therefore, Friendship Theory is a poor model for filial obligations.

4. Gratitude Theory

a. The View

According to Gratitude Theory, one owes gratitude to one’s parent in response to the parent’s benevolence toward the child, so long as this gratitude serves to support rather than undermine relationships of mutual respect. Although this has not been defended as an independent theory of filial obligation, gratitude theorists suggest that it is the natural grounding of such obligation. Fred Berger (1975), for instance, develops an account of gratitude, and briefly considers how it applies to the case of grown children:

The sort of continual sacrifice and caring involved in a decent upbringing is not reciprocated to parents by a warm handshake at the legal age of independence. While the notion of gratitude to one’s parents can easily be overdone, it is clear enough that an adequate showing of gratitude to them cannot be made with mere verbal expressions … It is very hard to say just what is appropriate, and it may be that there can be no answer in the abstract … It is clear, however, that a handshake or kiss on the cheek normally will not do.

Given Berger’s own account of gratitude, as well as Claudia Card’s (1988), the Gratitude Theory provides five considerations that aim to determine when obligations of gratitude arise and what such obligations entail. The five considerations are as follows:

Gratitude is a three-part relation: X is grateful to Y for Z.
Gratitude is generally warranted in response to another’s benevolence.
Gratitude is not something a benefactor has a right to, even though the beneficiary may owe it.
The beneficiary’s debt of gratitude is a relatively informal obligation.
Obligations associated with gratitude might be impossible to fulfill, though that does not imply that the obligation is itself overly demanding.

Before extending this theory to filial obligations, let us look briefly at each component.

First, gratitude is a three-part relation. Genuine gratitude is directed toward someone, and it is for something. One might be very glad to enjoy certain benefits, even when no one is responsible for providing them. Genuine gratitude, then, requires someone to whom one can be grateful.

Second, gratitude is in response to the motivations of another person, not only to the benefits or perceived benefits that person might provide. Berger (1975) articulates this consideration as follows: “Gratitude, then, does not consist in the requital of benefits but in a response to benevolence; it is a response to a grant of benefits (or the attempt to benefit us) which was motivated by a desire to help us.” To see why one might think that obligations of gratitude arise only in response to certain motivations, consider a case in which someone undertakes some action that benefits a friend, but this person does not foresee the benefit to her friend, and might have acted differently if she had foreseen this result. The friend does not owe gratitude for accidental benefits; if the person intended not to benefit her friend, gratitude seems inappropriate. Alternatively, if someone tries to benefit her friend but fails, the friend can be grateful for the effort, even though the effort yields no actual benefits.

Third, the benefactor has no right to gratitude, even if gratitude is owed. If a man is drowning and a passerby risks her life to save him, he certainly ought to be grateful to her. If he is not, she may rightfully feel that she has been mistreated, and third parties may rightfully judge him to be reprehensibly selfish. Even so, this Good Samaritan has no right to his gratitude such that she or third parties could require that he experience or express it or both.

Fourth, obligations of gratitude are relatively informal. Unlike debt repayment, the terms of these obligations are imprecise and flexible. In some cases, appropriate gratitude might be expressed with a “thank you,” whereas in others, gratitude might require greater sacrifice. Furthermore, obligations of gratitude may change over time if the relationship between the benefactor and beneficiary changes.

Fifth, the obligations might be ongoing and impossible to fulfill, but this does not mean that they are overly demanding. Consider again the case a passerby risking her own safety to rescue a drowning man. A mere “thank you” might not serve as a sufficient expression of his gratitude. This is the sort of case where it seems appropriate for him to say, “I can’t ever thank you enough.” Even if this is true, it does not mean that he owes the passerby lavish gifts, constant praise, or a first-born child. It means only that his gratitude ought to be ongoing. This is not necessarily a demanding obligation, however. Gratitude might require only that he thank her and continue to behave kindly toward her. On Berger’s view, expressions of gratitude need not be proportional to the benefits bestowed, for the motivation of the benefactor rather than the benefits themselves ground the obligation.

According to Gratitude Theory, the obligations one has to one’s parents are based on gratitude, and fulfilling those obligations serves as an expression of one’s gratitude. As in other moral relationships, gratitude in the parent-child relationship is not always appropriate. Parents who invest heavily in their child’s education might bestow substantial benefits on the child. However, the child may have no obligations of gratitude toward his parents if they sought to bestow such benefits exclusively for self-serving reasons. Berger cites fictional cases in which parents aim to keep their family in good social status and, driven by this aim, they try to secure as many benefits as possible for their child. Here, the child may feel grateful to his parents for these benefits. Nonetheless, the child does not owe gratitude. Because it is a response to benevolence, the child owes gratitude only if the parents attempt to bestow these benefits on the child for her benefit; the gratitude is in response to the parents’ motivations rather than the benefits themselves. When benevolent motivation is absent, there is no obligation of gratitude.

Gratitude Theory does not distinguish between those benefits the child voluntarily accepts and those the child does not. Blustein (1982) explains this feature of gratitude as follows:

That we did not request those services does not itself entail that we have no duty to show gratitude for them. Indeed, since gratitude is essentially a response to benevolence, it seems that we may have a duty to show gratitude (at some point) for benefits that we did not voluntarily accept but only received, and for benefits which, at the time they were provided, were judged to be benefits by the grantor alone, and not by the recipient.

Gratitude Theory does, however, distinguish between the lack of voluntary acceptance and a preference to not be the recipient of another’s generosity. In her discussion of Gratitude Theory, Card notes that gratitude may not be owed if the benefactor has disregarded the beneficiary’s wishes and cautions against confusing generosity with benevolence. Generosity, Card (1988) explains, “can be accompanied by insensitivity to others’ wishes with regard to becoming obligated” whereas “[g]enuine benevolence is incompatible with disregarding others’ willingness to become obligated. Those who lack such regard thereby lack respect.”

Furthermore, children may owe gratitude even for those benefits the parent was morally obligated to provide, such as food and shelter. After all, the parents need not provide food and shelter from a motive of duty. Rather, the parents may meet the child’s needs precisely because the parents have concern for the child’s wellbeing and want to benefit the child.

Appropriate expressions of gratitude are those that support rather than undermine the mutual respect necessary for moral relationships, and this constraint serves as an upper limit on the demands of such an obligation: whatever an obligation of gratitude requires of us, it cannot require that we forfeit our autonomy. Autonomy, according to Berger, entails broad control over the shape of our own lives. Berger (1975) offers the following justification for such a limit: “To treat someone as a person in his own right entails granting him the right to work out the plan of his life as he sees fit.” Mutual respect requires that both the parent and the child grant each other, and themselves, the right to work out the plans of their lives. Any infringement on or expectation that one will forfeit that right undermines respect within the relationship. In such a case, the parties neither see each other nor themselves as persons in their own right but rather as means to another’s ends. Because Berger considers mutual respect a necessary condition for moral relationships between persons, neither the expectation nor the expression of gratitude should undermine that respect, as doing so would harm the relationship.

Gratitude Theory is distinct from Friendship Theory in important ways, though many of the demands might overlap. As the filial ingratitude objection suggests, obligations of gratitude can extend beyond friendship, for even after a friendship dissolves, obligations of gratitude for past benevolence may persist. The basis for obligations of friendship is the friendship itself, whereas the basis for obligations of gratitude is benevolence. Although parents may behave benevolently toward their children because of a relationship that resembles a friendship, the friendship itself does not ground obligations of gratitude.

Returning to the example of those benefits the parent is required to provide, such as food and shelter, the difference between the two theories becomes clear. At the time that parents are morally obligated to provide such things—for instance, when the child is very young—a friendship might be forming such that in later years the two will have a relationship analogous to a friendship. At the moment, however, the child might be too young for the parent-child relationship to be comparable to even a non-ideal friendship. Although a friendship might form later, where obligations of friendship would then arise, the grounds for an obligation of gratitude might already be present. Whether or not a friendship later emerges between the two, the obligation of gratitude remains. Because the grounds for the obligations are distinct, so are the theories.

b. Criticism

Simon Keller and Brynn Welch each offer criticisms of Gratitude Theory. Consider the following example: two friends help a mutual friend move into a new house, but one finds moving enjoyable while the other finds it onerous. According to Keller, the beneficiary incurs a stronger or more extensive obligation of gratitude toward the friend who finds the process onerous. Analogously, a child owes more to a parent who sacrificed a great deal than she would owe to a parent whose sacrifice was less substantial. Keller finds this an unacceptable consequence of Gratitude Theory.

Keller also objects that filial obligations, unlike obligations of gratitude, are ongoing and open-ended, and if filial obligations were grounded in gratitude, we would have no gesture that would capture that gratitude. Sending a card or flowers seems laughably insufficient as a demonstration of gratitude. Expressions of such gratitude are made more difficult by the fact that we generally think that for most acts of benevolence, a card or flowers discharges our duty of gratitude; we have shown our appreciation for the benefactor’s benevolence, and nothing more is required of us.

Welch argues that Keller’s objections to Gratitude Theory are based on a mistaken or uncharitable interpretation of the view or both, and the theory can survive those objections. However, she argues that the theory does not offer any action-guiding principles and so cannot answer the question it seeks to answer: what do I owe my parents? This is not simply the claim that the theory does not specify the content of filial obligations, but rather it does not even tell us what sort of action is required. Gratitude Theory might require no action at all but only a certain emotional experience, namely the experience of being grateful to the benefactor. If the theory offers a range of possible expressions of gratitude, we will still require some guidance as to the appropriate range of actions; that is, we still need to know whether something like a thank-you or flowers would be appropriate, or whether something like paying for expensive medical care is required. If Gratitude Theory requires a particular emotional attitude, then it must answer well-known problems associated with requiring emotional experiences.

5. Special Goods Theory

a. The View

In response to what he sees as failures of Debt, Friendship, and Gratitude theories of filial obligation, Simon Keller offers Special Goods Theory. It has three conditions:

If (1) a parent needs some special good, (2) the parent has provided or currently provides special goods to the child, and (3) the child is able to provide the special good that the parent needs, then the child ought to provide that special good to the parent.

In contrast to the previous theories, Special Goods Theory of filial obligations focuses on the benefits to the child and the needs of the parent. Specifically, this theory states that the parent-child relationship is one that makes possible certain special goods. According to Keller (2006, 2007), special goods are those that “contribute to individual welfare, meaning that they are goods that benefit an individual, or that contribute to her well-being, or her best interests” and which “the parent can receive from no one (or almost no one) but the child, or the child can receive from no one (or almost no one) but the parent”. Generic goods, on the other hand, are those that can easily arise from other sources.

In making his case for Special Goods Theory, Keller (2007) states six intuitions about filial obligations and argues that his theory best explains those intuitions. He states them as follows:

“Filial duties are ongoing and open-ended; they are not duties that can be discharged once and for all.”
“The nature and extent of your filial duties do not vary with the exact nature or quantity of parental sacrifice involved in your upbringing; you do not have lesser filial duties for having been easy to raise.”
“Filial duties are not easily avoidable; the moral relationship from which they arise is not one that you choose to enter, nor one that you can simply choose to end.”
“But [filial duties] do vary with certain changes in your ongoing relationship with your parents; if your parents unreasonably disown you, for example, then your filial duties may not be what they were.”
“The demands made by filial duty do not extend so far that meeting them impedes your ability to exercise a reasonable amount of autonomous choice over the shape of your own life; you do not have filial duties to (for example) pursue a particular career, follow a particular religion, or give more financially than you can reasonably afford.”
“Filial duties can be, in a different respect, very demanding; if you can afford to pay for your parents’ medical care, for example, then filial duty can require you to do so, even if it is very expensive.”

Keller concludes from these intuitions that the parent-child relationship and, consequently, filial obligations, are unique. Unlike Debt theory and Friendship theory, Keller begins with the assumption that the parent-child relationship is not analogous to any other kind of relationship. The intuitions are worth discussing further, as Keller often appeals to them as justification for his theory of filial obligation.

First, Special Goods Theory can explain why filial obligations cannot be fulfilled once and for all. Satisfying the three conditions has no theoretical limit; consequently, the obligation can be ongoing. To determine a child’s filial obligations, we consider only whether the circumstances satisfy these three conditions; we do not consider whether these three conditions have been satisfied already. Fulfilling obligations in a particular instance does not preclude the continuous satisfaction of the conditions. Any time these conditions are satisfied, filial obligations arise, and the conditions can remain satisfied for as long as the parent is alive.

Second, Special Goods Theory explains why one does not have less extensive or fewer filial obligations for having been easy to raise. The extent of one’s obligations depends entirely on the three conditions being satisfied, not on the extent to which the third condition—that the child is able to provide the special good that the parent needs—is satisfied. Provided that a parent requires some special good and has in the past provided special goods to his or her children, and that the children enjoy reciprocal relationships with their parent, then any differences between what the children owe will result from differences in their abilities to provide for the parent.

Third, Special Goods Theory explains why we cannot easily escape filial obligations. Whether the conditions for filial obligations are satisfied is, to a large extent, out of our control. We cannot alter our parents’ needs, nor can we undo that they have previously provided us with special goods. Further, we cannot escape filial obligation simply by terminating the relationship. Doing so will not effect whether the conditions for filial obligations are satisfied.

Fourth, the nature of one’s relationship with one’s parents can shape the content of one’s filial obligations. Consider a case in which a mother has terminated her relationship with her child. Regardless of whether this action was justified, we can now reasonably make certain claims regarding her child’s filial obligations. For example, if the mother does not wish to speak to her child, then her child is no longer positioned to provide the good in question; that is, staying in touch with her mother. The child, however, may still have other filial obligations. Yet, these may also depend on the current nature of the relationship, for it can shape the content of the obligations.

Fifth, filial obligations are not so extensive as to impede one’s ability to exercise autonomy. The third condition of filial obligations is that one is uniquely positioned to provide certain goods. The theory does not include the further requirement that one positions oneself in order to provide such goods.

Finally, Special Goods Theory can explain why filial obligations can be demanding. The child has an obligation to provide expensive long-term care for the parent if the child can provide it and if the parent has provided special goods to the child in the past or at present. According to the conditions of this theory, the extent of the obligation depends on the extent of the need and the extent to which the child can provide the required special goods.

This theory can potentially generate a wide range of filial obligations, from virtually costless to oppressively demanding, for the three conditions could continue to be satisfied so long as the parent and child are alive. Nothing about discharging the obligation in a particular instance precludes the conditions from being satisfied again, thereby generating new obligations. Moreover, in societies that do not provide care for their ageing members, long-term care is a special good, for it is unlikely to be provided by a source outside of the relationship. In such a society, the child’s obligations might be extensive simply because of the parent’s needs. Importantly, though, this theory clearly tells us what our filial obligations are: we ought to provide our parents with the special goods they need, provided they have provided those goods to us in the past.

b. Criticism

According to Welch, Special Goods Theory does not respond appropriately to the relationship’s moral considerations, specifically those regarding what the parent deserves. Keller says that we owe our parents special goods in the context of reciprocity. According to Welch, there are three plausible interpretations of this restriction but none suffice to avoid his moral objection. The first interpretation is that parent-child relationships are, when things go well, reciprocal insofar as both the parent and child benefit from the relationship. At least, the child benefits during his early years and the parent in her later years. Yet, if Keller only means that the relationship is reciprocal in this minimal sense, he cannot justify his fourth intuition: filial obligations “vary with certain changes in your ongoing relationship with your parents; if your parents unreasonably disown you … then your filial duties may not be what they were.” If a reciprocal relationship requires only that the parent-child relationship is or was mutually beneficial, then so long as the parent has provided the benefits to the child in the past, the current state of the relationship is irrelevant except insofar as it affects a child’s ability to provide special goods to the parent. The current state of the relationship does not necessarily determine whether the relationship is reciprocal.

The second interpretation is that a reciprocal relationship might require ongoing reciprocity; that is, the parent and child enjoy a reciprocal relationship so long as each continues to benefit. This interpretation would justify the intuition in question, for if the relationship changes and is no longer reciprocal, then the child’s filial obligations would also change. This interpretation suggests, however, that filial obligations no longer exist once the parent cannot contribute to the relationship.

Welch argues that this is problematic by offering the following example: in a society in which care for elderly persons is the responsibility of private citizens, an elderly woman suffering from dementia requires medical care, and she has a wealthy daughter who can provide such care. Yet, because the mother is physically and mentally incapable of contributing goods to the relationship, the relationship is no longer reciprocal. The daughter is wondering whether she has an obligation to provide such care for her mother, since her mother needs the care, has provided care in the past, and the daughter can provide the care. It would seem remarkably callous of the daughter to think to herself, “I have no obligation to provide the care my mother needs because, despite her care for me in the past, she no longer contributes to a reciprocal relationship.” Welch argues that filial obligations do not disappear simply because the parent is currently unable to provide special goods to the child. Thus, although the current state of the relationship would, on this interpretation of Keller’s reciprocity, determine the daughter’s filial obligations, it would do so counter-intuitively.

According to Welch, Keller’s claim that filial obligations arise “within the context of a reciprocal relationship” cannot limit filial obligations in the way Keller suggests. Either the parent-child relationship is reciprocal so long as it is now or was mutually beneficial, or it is reciprocal only when the mutual benefits are ongoing. In the former case, the relationship’s current state would determine filial obligations only insofar as it effects what the child can provide. Here, filial obligations are theoretically unlimited, regardless of the current state of the relationship. In the latter case, filial obligations diminish or disappear if the parent is no longer able to provide special goods to the child, even if this inability is not by choice. Here, filial obligations are unreasonably limited because children have obligations to their parents only so long as the children continue to benefit.

Welch considers a third interpretation of Keller’s reciprocity limitation on filial obligations. One could say that the parent-child relationship is reciprocal so long as:

a) The parent has provided special goods in the past, and continues to do so, or;
b) The parent has not provided special goods in the past, but does so now, or;
c) The parent has provided special goods in the past but now cannot provide them because, through no fault of her own, she is unable to do so.

This attempt to rescue the “reciprocal relationship” limitation on filial obligations appears ad hoc. Why think the relationship is no longer reciprocal only because parents fail to “make a reasonable effort to play their part in the relationship”? If parents fail to play their part—though perhaps not by choice—the relationship is no longer reciprocal. Thus, although the reason the relationship is no longer reciprocal is relevant for determining what obligations a grown child has, the “reciprocal relationship” limitation within Special Goods Theory cannot explain why. According to Welch, what is missing from the theory is a clear account of what changes in a relationship effect what filial obligations a child has and why.

Thus, Welch concludes that Special Goods Theory ignores morally relevant considerations, such as what the parent deserves, when surely, it is relevant to determining what one owes one’s parent. Facts about the relationship’s current state form not only what one can do for one’s parent, but also what one’s parent deserves to have done on her behalf. A mother who suffers from dementia does not deserve less because it renders her unable to contribute to the relationship, whereas a father who has unreasonably disowned his son arguably deserves less as a result of his choice to exit the relationship.

6. Gratitude for Special Goods

a. The View

Brynn Welch introduced Gratitude for Special Goods Theory in 2012, arguing that one has obligations of gratitude to provide special goods to one’s parent so long as the following four conditions are satisfied:

The parent needs some special good.
The child can position herself to provide the good.
The parent has provided and/or currently provides special goods to the child.
Expressing gratitude by providing the special good the parent needs would not undermine the mutual respect on which moral relationships are based.

Welch argues that Debt Theory and Special Goods Theory do not respond to the right features of a case—namely, features about the parent-child relationship itself—and Gratitude Theory and Friendship Theory fail to provide sufficient guidance for discharging one’s filial obligations. Gratitude for Special Goods Theory, however, avoids both of these problems.

According to Welch, this theory is responsive to considerations of the parent’s needs, the child’s ability, and what the parent deserves. Furthermore, the theory specifies the action necessary to discharge one’s filial obligations: one ought to provide the special good that the parent needs. Relying heavily on Berger’s and Card’s considerations regarding gratitude, and Keller’s articulation of special goods, Welch offers a blended theory.

Yet, Welch modifies Keller’s condition that the child be able to meet the parent’s need. Consider a situation where a grown child’s career path does not provide the means necessary to pay for her parent’s long-term care. If, however, the child has career opportunities that would make her able to meet her parent’s needs, then she has an obligation to pursue those opportunities (provided all other conditions for filial obligations are satisfied). On Gratitude for Special Goods Theory, in order to avoid filial obligations, the children must be both unable to meet current needs and to position themselves to meet those needs without undermining the mutual respect necessary for moral relationships. This way of modifying Keller’s condition prohibits us from using a narrow understanding of ability.

Furthermore, Welch argues that her theory of filial obligations is superior to Special Goods Theory because it responds appropriately to considerations of what the parent deserves. On Keller’s view, the past provision of goods and the ongoing reciprocal relationship ground the child’s obligation, whereas on Welch’s view, gratitude for the past provision of goods grounds the obligation. The difference, Welch argues, is that gratitude requires that both parties respect one another and themselves, and the provision of special goods is an appropriate expression of that respect. Thus, if the parent has provided special goods in the past but either done so with the expectation of repayment or has at some point come to treat the child as merely a means to an end, the child has no obligations of gratitude since gratitude might undermine rather than support relationships of mutual respect. The child might experience gratitude, but that gratitude is not required and might even be inappropriate.

According to Welch, this theory has several advantages over its predecessors. First, it responds to relevant considerations, such as the parent’s need, the child’s ability, and the past and current state of the relationship. Second, it specifies what we ought to do for our parents. Third, it explains the changes in the parent-child relationship that would change a grown child’s obligations to his parents. Specifically, any changes that undermine mutual respect would diminish or eliminate filial obligations; any changes that restore mutual respect would generate or strengthen filial obligations. Finally, it responds to the demands of justice and offers a moral argument for gender equality in care provisions for ageing parents.

Where earlier theories are concerned with meeting parents’ needs, or that there is repayment as in the case of Debt Theory, Gratitude for Special Goods Theory is concerned with the moral relationships in which these “transactions” take place. Theories focusing only on the goods themselves cannot explain what is wrong with the striking gender imbalance in the provision of these goods. Gratitude for Special Goods Theory can do just that, according to Welch. She argues that a son who either shifts the responsibility of parental care to his sister or wife has already failed to discharge his filial obligations. It does not simply matter that the goods are provided but also who provides them. The son owes his parents gratitude for the past provision of special goods; his wife does not. Similarly, when parental care falls exclusively, or almost exclusively, on female siblings, this indicates that male siblings are failing to discharge obligations. Again, that the parents’ needs are being met does not relieve the male siblings of their obligations of gratitude. Thus, Welch argues this theory is preferable to the previous theories.

b. Criticism

As the theory is the newest in the field, it has not yet received written criticism. Yet, there are two paths such criticism would likely take. First, its second condition—that the child is able to position herself to provide the required good—ignores the likely state of epistemic uncertainty under which the child will have to make decisions. If one is to choose a career based on what one anticipates one’s parents will need, this seems to require that one have access to information about future events. Will my parents live long, healthy lives, or succumb to illness during my college career? Will I be able to rely on my siblings, my spouse, and possibly my siblings’ spouses for assistance? The answers to these questions, and many like them, will shape the content of one’s filial obligations. Yet, they are questions that one cannot possibly know the answer in advance. The condition requires only that one be able to position oneself to provide the required good. The ability to so position oneself, however, depends on facts about the good in question that are likely to be unknown at the time one makes decisions about what career to pursue, where to live, what sort of family structure to create, and so forth. Thus, Welch’s theory seems to imply that children must make choices that will accommodate the maximum range of possible parental needs. Yet, it is unclear what such a choice would be.

A related but different objection is that the theory generates obligations that are too stringent. A grown child could, for example, position herself to provide special goods to her parents by forgoing having children of her own, thus freeing up time and money for her parents that would otherwise be spent on children. Does this person have an obligation to forego having children? Although Welch argues, following Card and Berger, that one is not required to sacrifice one’s serious interests, questions remain about what constitutes a legitimate serious interest. Is an interest in world travel serious enough that one may choose travel over providing special goods to one’s parents? If the answer is yes, then Gratitude for Special Goods Theory may face problems similar to those facing Friendship Theory: the child can simply opt out of filial obligations by cultivating other serious interests. If the answer is no, then Gratitude for Special Goods Theorists seem to be left with only two options: explain the morally relevant difference between one’s interest in child-rearing and one’s interest in world travel, or accept that one’s serious interests do not override one’s filial obligations. If Gratitude for Special Goods Theorists select the first option, they are likely to find themselves constructing a perfectionist account of interests. If they select the second, they are likely to find themselves endorsing overly demanding and counter-intuitive obligations.

7. References and Further Reading

Berger, Fred. “Gratitude,” Ethics, Vol. 85, No. 4 (1975), pp. 298-309.
- Berger offers considerations regarding the role of gratitude in moral relationships, as well as the foundation of a gratitude theory of filial obligation.
Blustein, Jeffrey. Parents and Children: The Ethics of the Family, New York: Oxford University Press (1982).
- The text includes brief descriptions of the obligations parents and children have to one another and possible grounds of those obligations.
Brighouse, Harry and Swift, Adam. “Legitimate Parental Partiality,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, Vol. 37, No. 1 (2009), pp. 43-80.
- The article contains an argument for balancing parental partiality against a concern for fair equality of opportunity. It also discusses the special goods that a parent-child relationship makes possible.
Brody, Elaine. Women in the Middle: Their Parent Care Years, 2^nd edition. New York: Springer (2004).
- Brody’s sociological work contains both quantitative and qualitative data about women who care for elderly parents and young children concurrently
Card, Claudia. “Gratitude and Obligation,” American Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 25, No. 2 (1988), pp. 115-127.
- The article considers the role of gratitude in moral relationships with an emphasis on many problematic instances of gratitude.
Chappell, Neena L. and Penning, Margaret J. “Family Caregivers: Increasing Demands in the Context of 21^st Century Globalization?” in Cambridge Handbook for Age and Ageing, Malcolm L. Johnson, ed. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press (2005), pp. 455-462.
- This chapter discusses effects of policy changes, economics, and health for caregivers.
Daniels, Norman. Am I My Parents’ Keeper? An Essay on Justice Between the Young and the Old, New York: Oxford University Press (1988).
- The text presents Daniels’ historical and philosophical reflection on intergenerational justice with respect to health care.
Dixon, Nicholas. “The Friendship Model of Filial Obligations,” Journal of Applied Philosophy, Vol. 12, No. 1 (1995), pp. 77-87.
- This article includes a defense of Friendship Theory of filial obligations against initial objections.
English, Jane. “What Do Grown Children Owe Their Parents?” in Having Children: Philosophical and Legal Reflections on Parenthood, Onora O’Neill and William Ruddick, eds. New York: Oxford University Press (1979), pp. 351-356.
- The chapter presents the Friendship Theory of filial obligation.
Fitzgerald, Patrick. “Gratitude and Justice,” Ethics, Vol. 109, No. 1 (1998), pp. 119-153.
- This article discusses how obligations of gratitude extend to politics.
Hardwig, John. “Is There A Duty to Die?” from Hastings Center Report 27, No. 2 (1997), reprinted in Ethical Issues in Modern Medicine: Contemporary Readings in Bioethics, 7^th edition. Bonnie Steinbock, John D. Arras, and Alex John London, eds. New York: McGraw-Hill (2009), pp. 511-520.
- This article argues that older individuals, namely those who will experience financial and emotional hardship from continued care, might have a societal obligation to die.
Ivanhoe, Philip J. “Filial Piety as a Virtue,” in Working Virtue: Virtue Ethics and Contemporary Moral Problems, Rebecca L. Walker and Philip J. Ivanhoe, eds. Oxford: Clarendon Press (2007), pp. 297-312.
- Here, Ivanhoe articulates piety as the appropriate attitude to have toward one’s parents.
Jecker, Nancy S. “Are Filial Duties Unfounded?” American Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 26, No. 1 (1989), pp. 73-80.
- In this article, Jecker discusses whether filial obligations can arise at all.
Jecker, Nancy S. “Taking Care of One’s Own: Justice and Family Caregiving,” Theoretical Medicine, Vol. 23 (2002), pp. 117-133.
- Here, Jecker discusses justice, gender, and filial obligations.
Keller, Simon. “Four Theories of Filial Duty,” The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 56, No. 223 (2006), pp. 254-274.
- This article introduces and articulates the Special Goods Theory of filial obligations.
Keller, Simon. The Limits of Loyalty, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press (2007).
- Here, Keller discusses appropriate versus inappropriate loyalty. Also, theories of filial obligation are discussed at length.
Kupfer, Joseph. “Can Parents and Children Be Friends?” American Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 27, No. 1 (1990), pp. 15-26.
- Kupfer criticizes Jane English’s Friendship Theory, emphasizing the inequality of autonomy within the parent-child relationship and the lack of sufficient distance between the parent and child.
Narveson, Jan. “On Honoring our Parents,” Southern Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 25, No. 1 (1987), pp. 65-78.
- Here, Narveson argues that we ought to care for our parents because we want to make it rational for others to have and rear children.
Okin, Susan Moller. Justice, Gender, and the Family, United States: Basic Books (1989).
- Okin discusses the causes and effects of gender inequality.
Sommers, Christina Hoff. “Filial Morality,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 83, No. 8 (1986), pp. 439-456.
- This article argues that we ought to provide care for our parents because failure to do so violates the parent’s legitimate expectations.
Welch, Brynn. “A Theory of Filial Obligation,” Social Theory and Practice, Vol. 38, No. 4 (2012), pp. 717-737.
- Welch discusses Gratitude and Special Goods Theory, and articulates and defends Gratitude for Special Goods Theory.

Author Information

Brynn F. Welch
Email: bwelch@uab.edu
University of Alabama at Birmingham
U. S. A.

The Geometrical Method

The Geometrical Method is the style of proof (also called “demonstration”) that was used in Euclid’s proofs in geometry, and that was used in philosophy in Spinoza’s proofs in his Ethics. The term appeared first in 16^th century Europe when mathematics was on an upswing due to the new science of mechanics. Before that, geometry had been taught as a merely theoretical discipline without being connected to natural philosophy. In contrast, natural philosophy had been based on observation, experiment, and speculation, not at all on mathematics. Galileo, though, saw the connection; he envisioned nature as a book written in mathematical signs and thus he emphasized the study of mathematics to understand nature. His initial quest for the mathematization of nature was continued by Descartes. Descartes asked for the cultivation of a new sort of geometry that would no longer be a mere abstract enterprise but could explain the phenomena of nature.

Although the use of the Geometrical Method and of mathematization more broadly became the success story of modern sciences, it faced resistance from those who believed its use led to the disenchantment of the world and the vanishing of miracles. The opponents often accused modern philosophers of haughtiness if they applied the Geometrical Method. Galileo was blamed for claiming an equality between human knowledge and God’s knowledge, at least in geometrical things. Galileo had stated that whatever we humans could demonstrate geometrically could not be known any better by God because it was necessarily true. Moreover, the constraint of geometrical demonstrations, extended to real things in nature and society, even to human beings, opened questions about the freedom of the human will, stirring up philosophical and theological debates, lasting to some extent even into our own days.

The Geometrical Method
The Essential Significance of Definitions
Adequate Ideas and A Priori Knowledge We Share with God
The Place of Empirical Knowledge in the Geometrical Method
Geometrical Method and Logic of Containment
The Mathematization of Nature as a Challenge of Necessitarianism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Abbreviations
2. Bibliography

1. The Geometrical Method

When we think of the Geometrical Method today, we usually associate it with what we see when we open a book of Euclid, or (if we are looking for its use in philosophy) what we see in Spinoza’s Ethics. Instead of a coherent flow of text, the lines are broken up into different types of text: definitions, axioms, postulates, propositions, and demonstrations. As we all learn in school, a geometrical demonstration has to start from definitions of things, which are supposed to allow for the deduction of conclusions about properties of the defined things because these properties are already (virtually) involved in the definitions. A common example is the definition of a triangle. Here it follows necessarily from its definition—being composed of three straight lines—that its angles sum up to 180^o. To be sure, this definition is true for all triangles in Euclidean geometry necessarily and thus with absolute certainty. Geometrical demonstrations also use axioms, being statements that everybody will admit as self-evidently true, and postulates, statements which are hypothetically claimed as long as nobody objects. Both axioms and postulates are considered permitted additions to definitions that allow for a geometrical demonstration in which it is shown how the conclusions necessarily follow from the definitions.

This way of demonstration has been known since ancient Greek mathematics, mostly through Euclid’s Elements. However, the term “Geometrical Method” only came up much later, in early modern times. Jacobo Zabarella, who wrote in late 16th century in Padua, described this method as involving two aspects, namely the resolutive and the compositive, also known as the analytic and synthetic side of the Geometrical Method (Cassirer 1974, I, 136-44). While the analytic part is considered to be helpful for discovery and invention of new truths, the synthetic is appreciated for ensuring the certainty of the results due to a complete deduction of propositions from definitions and axioms, that is, by geometrical demonstration. It was the synthetic method that provided the compelling force for the argument being thus capable of convincing others of the correctness of a proposition. Leibniz emphasized the eminent significance of such a demonstration when he referred to Euclid. The Greek mathematician had been mocked for his cumbersome demonstration of something even children could easily see, namely that two straight lines cannot surround a space and that they can only share one point. But Leibniz praised Euclid for demonstrating this anyway because he did not make the demonstration to know it but to know it with certainty (A VI, 1, N. 125, 469).

Pascal, in a text which came down to us as an inclusion in the Port-Royal Logic of Antoine Arnauld and Pierre Nicole, provided a comprehensive description of the synthetic aspect of the Geometrical Method, which he then again broke down into two major demands: not to employ any term in a demonstration that had not yet been defined and not to accept any proposition which had not yet been demonstrated from defined terms or demonstrated propositions (Pascal 2000, 155-6). While only Spinoza, notoriously, explicitly uses the synthetic method in his major work Ethics, the rationalist authors follow this very method when presenting their arguments. They begin with definitions and deduce their entire argument from them (for example, A IV, 1, N. 1). It should be noticed that all rationalists were advanced mathematicians, although only Descartes and Leibniz were mathematical geniuses.

The strict demands of the Geometrical Method opened the space for discussion not only about the status of axioms not being demonstrated but also about that of definitions. Did definitions depend on human choice of words or did they have to express the essence of the defined thing? If the latter, how could we know the essence of a thing, and if the former, how would arbitrary definitions lead to truth? While the constraint of geometrical demonstrations, that is, their convincing force, could never be questioned once the definitions were admitted, it was the concept of definition and to a smaller extent that of axiom which moved to the center of the discussion about the Geometrical Method.

While providing absolute certainty, the synthetic aspect of the Geometrical Method had also disadvantages. Due to the rules not to employ any concept before defining it and not to use any proposition before demonstrating it, the way of presenting an argument had to follow the course in which these definitions and propositions could be demonstrated, which often interrupted the natural course of the argument. Also, the apparatus of definitions, axioms, postulates, propositions, and their demonstrations was quite cumbersome. Finally, the striving for unequivocal expressions did not allow for metaphors, ironies, or jokes and thus lacked entertaining qualities.

It is very common to associate the synthetic or compositive aspect with the Geometrical Method and to neglect the analytical side. However, scientists and mathematicians have always been more interested in the analytic aspect of the Geometrical Method because they aimed to discover new truths. In using the analytic or resolutive method, they did not even care much about a gapless deduction (Breger 2008, 191-2). Rather, they trusted their intuition, based on their intensive foregoing studies and deep knowledge about their subject. Philosophers also used the analytic side of the Geometrical Method, and Descartes even preferred it in his writing, stating that he wanted to write following the path in which he found the truth rather than presenting it by geometric demonstration (AT VII, 211-3; CSM II, 110-1). Spinoza, according to Tschirnhaus’ reports to Christian Wolff (Wolff 1980, 124-7; Corr 1972, 323-34), developed the analytic method in order to find and constantly improve definitions, using experiments and observation. He started with mere nominal definitions for things insufficiently known and replaced them (or parts of them) by causal definitions in the course of progress in his ability to produce the effects (Goldenbaum 2011, 29-41). Tschirnhaus, who was above all a mathematician and an engineer (he invented, for example, Meissen porcelain), further developed this method of defining and redefining objects of natural science based on empirical research. Christian Wolff used this method systematically to reduce the gap between a priori knowledge and experiential knowledge. When, for example, he wrote about methods to increase the growth of grain, he distinguished between facts we know from experience and the causes of some phenomena we know with certainty and have thus under control (Wolff 1734; Goldenbaum 2011). Although we cannot know the essence of the plants yet, we can come to know some causal processes of the growing of plants and thus can even predict the outcome with a high degree of certainty.

It was the goal of the analytic part of the Geometrical Method to improve the definitions of real things—not only of geometrical figures. Due to the negligence of the analytic aspect of the Geometrical Method, the understanding of definitions in the framework of the modern Geometrical Method is often insufficient.

2. The Essential Significance of Definitions

Although it was the geometrical demonstrations that guaranteed necessary truths, they were hardly under attack. Instead, it was the definitions and, to a smaller extent, the axioms that moved to the center of the philosophical discussion because they were the starting point of the Geometrical Method—in particular, of its synthetic part. Surprisingly, partisans and critics agreed about the essential significance of the definitions.

Of course, axioms also became a subject of criticism by the opponents of the Geometrical Method because, traditionally, they were not demonstrated but assumed to be evident. Critics argued that a demonstration built upon undemonstrated axioms could not guarantee the truth of the demonstrated proposition. Hobbes rose to this challenge, arguing that all axioms could actually be demonstrated as soon as anybody would doubt them. Spinoza and Leibniz agreed. As an example, Hobbes and Leibniz demonstrated the axiom that had become disputed at the time, namely that the part is smaller than the whole (OL I, 105-6; De corpore II, 8, sec. 25; Leibniz A II, 1 2006, 281; A VI, 2, 480). As a result, Hobbes (OL I, 252-8; De corpore III, 20, sec. 6) and, following him, Leibniz (Leibniz, A VI, 1, N. 12; A II, 1 2006, N. 24, 153) conceived geometrical demonstrations as mere chains of definitions (axioms or postulates being capable of demonstration, if doubted). According to Leibniz, the only true axioms were identical propositions that could not be demonstrated.

But it was the concept of definition which bore the brunt of the attacks throughout the 17th and 18th centuries. Critics insisted that an extension of the Geometrical Method to real things would be impossible because we could not give any real definition of any real thing, in sharp contrast to real definitions of geometrical subjects, which we could provide. Since geometrical figures were created by humans, we could know their essence. Because real things were created by God, or at least not by human beings, their essences remained unknown to us, due to our finite minds and moreover to our fall. The same criticism can still be found in Locke and Kant.

Traditionally, there existed a general distinction between nominal and real definitions going back to Aristotle’s Organon (Anal. Post. II, 7-10). Even the new Cartesian Port-Royal Logic (L’art de penser), written by Arnauld and Nicole, kept this traditional distinction (Arnaud/Nicole 2011, 325-31; Logique de Port-Royal I, 12). While a nominal definition was nothing but words by which we named things, either by convention or by custom, without knowing the essence of the thing, a real definition would allow us to know whether the defined thing was real or at least possible in reality. Real definitions were usually supposed to be possible in mathematics, due to their human production, but also in theology, at least for the notion of God, although the latter was increasingly doubted. Pascal, for example, after his religious turn, did not accept any but nominal definitions because human beings were unable to know any real definitions (Pascal 2000, 156). In his view, we could define things as we liked, arbitrarily, and therefore there could never be a cause for serious contradiction but in mere words. This radical position, rejecting any role of reason for religion, was strongly contradicted by Arnauld and Nicole, who defended the real definitions in their Port-Royal Logic.

Here again, Hobbes took on the challenge and developed a new approach to real definitions. The way he does this sheds quite some light on how the new Geometrical Method of early modern time was indeed new, namely, infected by the new science of mechanics. Hobbes connected the issue of definitions with Galileo’s mechanics (Jesseph 1999, 117-25). Considering geometrical figures as produced by mechanical motion (already done by the mathematician Roberval), he understood them as effects caused by mechanical motion. A definition which included the cause of the thing to be defined showed at the same time that it was possible. In this way, it provided the opportunity to deduce any possible property of the thing, that is, even of those properties we are not yet aware of. A circle, for example, is produced by the mechanical motion of one endpoint of a straight line around the other endpoint. All the possible properties of a circle can be deduced from this causal definition, necessarily.

But Hobbes then introduced this new mechanical approach to definitions into philosophy and demanded such causal definitions (or genetic definitions) in philosophy too, in order to produce necessary conclusions about reality. Indeed, he uses the term “philosophy” (or “science”) exclusively for causal explanations of phenomena, starting from causal definitions (OL I, 62-65; De corpore I, 6,6). According to Hobbes, just as within geometry, a definition that includes the mechanical cause of the thing to be defined can serve in any field of science to deduce all the properties of the thing (OL I, 71-3; De corpore I, 6, 13). Hobbes thus transforms the Geometrical Method into a general epistemological principle: what we can generate, that is, cause, we can know with certainty, in its essence, or—with necessity. That is the reason why he can claim that we can even come to know the political state by philosophy, that is, in a scientific way, namely through causal explanation—because it is produced, generated, or caused by human beings.

Hobbes’ innovation of causal definitions was adopted (together with the Geometrical Method) by Spinoza (Spinoza 1985, 31-2), by Leibniz, and by Christian Wolff (Cassirer 1974, II, 521-5; Goldenbaum 2011). Leibniz discusses the traditional distinction of nominal and real definitions as still taught in the Port-Royal Logic. According to his explanation, nominal definitions result from our clear and distinct perception of things and their properties which we can name. Such nominal definitions allow us to distinguish these clearly and distinctly perceived things from other things. Confused ideas, though, where we cannot give single properties although we somehow recognize a thing in its entirety, do not allow yet for any definition. They may be made more (and more) distinct by analysis though, that is, by further distinguishing their parts (On Synthesis and Analysis, Loemker 229-34; A VI, 4, N. 129).

In contrast to such nominal definitions, being a name for a mere listing of properties, Leibniz defines real definitions as including and displaying the possibility of the defined thing, that is, freedom from contradiction (Loemker 231; A VI, 4, N. 129, 542). His example is the definition of a circle—that is, Euclid’s definition of a circle as produced by the motion of a straight line in a plane around one of its endpoints. This definition, being clearly a causal definition (christened so by Hobbes), is for Leibniz a real definition in an exemplary way because it displays the demanded possibility of its subject. But Leibniz does not even mention any other type of real definitions (Loemker 230-1; A VI, 4, N. 129, 541)

Moreover, Hobbes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, all extended the scope of causal definitions further, arguing that not only those definitions that include the actual cause of a thing but any definition that includes a cause capable to bring about the thing to be defined, can serve as its causal definition. If we can generate a thing, it is at the same time shown that it is possible. Surprisingly, Leibniz uses this extended concept of the causal definition to develop his modern concepts of hypothesis and of truth. He writes, “to set up a hypothesis or to explain the method of production is merely to demonstrate the possibility of the thing” (Loemker 231). That is, for Leibniz, a hypothesis that can explain a possible generation or causation of a thing shows its possibility and is capable of deducing all the properties of the subject of the hypothesis even if it will never come into reality.

All rationalists using the Geometrical Method intended to use it beyond geometry, making the generability of a thing through human beings the new approach to science which also changed the approach to empirical investigation. They all had a strong awareness that knowledge starting from causal definitions could provide necessary knowledge, that is, a priori knowledge about things beyond geometry. It is seldom noticed that exactly this position is already held by Galileo: “all these properties [of things in nature] are in effect virtually included in the definitions of all things; and ultimately, through being infinite, are perhaps but one in their essence and in the Divine mind” (Galilei 1967, 104).

3. Adequate Ideas and A Priori Knowledge We Share with God

The mathematician and rationalist Descartes did not yet talk of causal definitions. But in his reply to Arnauld about his fourth meditation (AT VII, 220; CSM, II, 155), he describes something he calls an “adequate idea,” which is precisely what is described as a causal definition by Hobbes. Just like causal definitions, adequate ideas have the capacity to virtually include all properties that belong to the cognized/defined thing. The term “adequate ideas” is more familiar to us from Spinoza and Leibniz. Descartes uses it indeed rarely and only with greatest caution: he does not ascribe adequate ideas to human beings but to God exclusively. According to Descartes, only God, knowing everything, can be assured to know whether an idea indeed contained all the properties of the thing. In contrast, while human beings may know all properties of a thing, they can only be sure of its completeness by a special revelation of God.

Moreover, not only could God have created things in a different way, even mathematics could have been shaped differently if God had willed so (AT I, 145, 149-50; CSMK III, 23-4). While this statement caused headaches and criticism among rationalists such as Spinoza and Leibniz, they all yet understood Descartes as a partisan of the Geometrical Method. They admired his insistence on intuition and deduction as the only way to certainty in knowledge, that is, to a priori knowledge. And indeed, while giving up about our reach to adequate ideas, Descartes does introduce the notion of a complete idea being available to human beings. And such complete notions would contain virtually all the properties of the ideatum, making it look like an adequate idea, with the only restriction that only God could know if it was indeed complete in respect to all consequences.

Descartes’ cautious distinction between adequate and complete ideas will not be upheld by his followers. For Spinoza, it is precisely our adequate ideas, which we share with God’s intellect, that allow for certainty of our knowledge (Spinoza 1985, 474-8; EII, p.37-p.40s2) as well as for overcoming our lack of freedom. Adequate ideas will even make our mind eternal (Spinoza 1985, 613-7; EV, p.38-42s). Spinoza defines “adequate idea” as “an idea which, insofar as it is considered in itself, without relation to an object, has all the properties, or intrinsic denominations of a true idea” (Spinoza 1985, 447; EII, d4). Thus, he explicitly denies correspondence of an idea with an external object as a criterion for adequacy and thereby denies the traditional understanding of adequacy in Aristotelian scholastics as agreement or correspondence of idea and ideatum. For Spinoza, to have an adequate idea is to provide the proximate cause of the thing to be known or to define a thing by its cause. That is, he introduces the adequate idea as causal definition or deduction from causal definitions.

Even Leibniz, the committed Christian philosopher, accepted a human capability for adequate ideas. He agreed that if we know things adequately, we know them with the same certainty by which they are known by God. Such an adequate idea is given whenever the thing can be completely analyzed into its simple primitive concepts, which is precisely the case in geometrical causal definitions. Leibniz praised adequate ideas for their special capacity that from them “all truths [can be demonstrated] with the exception of identical propositions, which by their very nature are evidently indemonstrable and can truly be called axioms” (Loemker 231; A VI, 4, N. 129, 542). Just like Spinoza, Leibniz connects adequate ideas with causal definitions because such definitions, in contrast to nominal definitions, immediately display the possibility of the defined thing, without any experiment or observation: “Obviously, we cannot build a secure demonstration on any concept unless we know that this concept is possible … This is an a priori reason why possibility is a requisite in a real definition” (ibid.).

It is precisely from this Geometrical Method that Leibniz arrives at his containment logic, stating that a reason can be given for each truth “for the connection of the predicate with the subject is either evident in itself as in identities, or can be explained by an analysis of the terms. This is the only, and the highest, criterion of truth in abstract things, that is, things which do not depend on experience—that it must either be an identity or be reducible to identities” (Loemker 232; A VI, 4, N. 129, 543). From here, Leibniz states that the elements of eternal truths can be deduced and a method provided for everything if they are only cognized as demonstratively as in geometry. Of course, God cognizes everything in this way, even concrete things, that is, a priori and “sub specie aeternitatis”—because He does not need any experience. While He knows everything adequately and intuitively, we can grasp hardly anything in this way and have to rely for most things on experience.

It is interesting that in Wolffianism, when it comes to German translations, the term “idea adaequata” is bluntly translated as “complete idea” [“vollständiger Begriff”] (Spinoza 1744), thereby ignoring Descartes’ cautious distinction between complete ideas available to human beings and adequate ideas available to God. However, while all rationalists agree that human beings can know a certain number of necessary demonstrations and to that extent have adequate ideas, that is, a priori knowledge equaling divine knowledge (the latter claim not being shared by Hobbes), this view is moderated by their awareness that such a priori knowledge is extremely limited in human beings and has therefore to be supplemented by experience. Galileo, Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, all admit a difference between divine and human knowledge—a difference consisting in God’s thoroughgoing intuitive knowledge of all things in contrast to human discursive knowledge of very few things. Still, a few intuitive insights were available to human beings too (Galilei 1967, 103-4; see also AT X, 409 (Reg. XI)). However, they stated the special character of this kind of knowledge which we shared with God, its absolute certainty due to its a priori character.

Adequate ideas are thus, from Descartes via Spinoza to Leibniz, ideas which provide a complete and absolutely certain knowledge of all the properties of their subject, independent of any knowledge of correspondence, that is, of sense perceptions. Although we can only reach a small amount of adequate ideas, this kind of knowledge is absolutely certain, a priori, that is, necessary and thus equal with divine knowledge. Causal definitions as the central part of the new Geometrical Method were crucial to obtaining such adequate ideas. It is this kind of knowledge which distinguishes us from animals. According to Hobbes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, it goes without saying that animals could think. But they could only think in an empirical way, by observation, trial and error, or by induction. They absolutely lacked necessary or a priori knowledge which we humans shared alone with God. Only human beings had the capability to have adequate ideas, a priori knowledge they shared with God.

4. The Place of Empirical Knowledge in the Geometrical Method

While God knows everything adequately and intuitively, we humans rarely get to know adequate ideas intuitively. Therefore, all rationalists agreed that in acquiring knowledge we usually need to rely, not just on intuition, but also on empirical knowledge. It is a widespread prejudice, due to German Idealism, that rationalists were not interested in empirical studies [see Continental Rationalism], but Descartes and Spinoza themselves performed experiments, and they all were highly interested in the scientific experiments of their time. They took, however, a very different approach to empirical studies than did the empiricists.

Although we are able to know only a few things with absolute certainty, what we are able to know in that way provides us with a fixed framework to order and interpret empirical data. Because “the fixed and eternal things” (Spinoza 1985, 41) that we know a priori are closely connected to the particular concrete things of which only God has adequate ideas, the necessary knowledge we have will help us to order our empirical data. Because these eternal abstract truths can never contradict any predicate of a complete notion or adequate idea of a concrete thing, they can provide a strong framework for our empirical work, which is available to our finite minds. When we come to learn about new facts by experience and by history, we can expect these single facts to fit into the theoretical framework such as the pieces of an unfinished puzzle, and build more and more a complete notion of an individual and its action. Therefore, Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz strongly recommend the development of empirical sciences that combine a priori knowledge with experiment in mixed sciences, supposed to enrich human knowledge.

Of course, this process of learning can never be conclusive because it is infinite due to the infinite properties of concrete particular things, or individuals. Nevertheless, our expectation that things in the world are coherent (based on the conviction of a theoretical framework that is adequately known by God, a priori, and thus must exist), together with the available specific notions of abstract things we as human beings can reach a priori, provide powerful tools. It is as if we had an unfinished map, a compass, and a watch that, with our general framework of terrestrial geography, can guide an expedition into an unknown area. Such equipment can help us to recognize coherence and causal interconnectedness in the otherwise confusingly rich abundance of single facts of empirically obtained knowledge. Therefore, Leibniz’s, Spinoza’s, and Hobbes’ approach to empirical research is completely different from any empiricist approach to nature or history. Empiricists claim to collect facts in order to check for common patterns or similarities and then to abstract rules or laws from them. If appropriate, mathematics could be applied to these abstractions. But no cognition reached by such a process could ever provide certainty, and it must remain provisional due to the general weakness of the fallen men.

This distinction between rationalists and empiricists in respect to empirical studies becomes plain in Spinoza’s criticism of Boyle, who saw his experiments as demonstrating mechanical corpuscular philosophy. Instead, Spinoza argued Boyle’s experiments would fit a hypothesis which he had held before and which had to be justified by its inner coherence alone while it could not be proved by any experiment (Spinoza 1985, 173-88, esp. 178). Leibniz quotes this statement with agreement in his argument with Locke (A VI, 6, N. 2, 454-5; Leibniz 1996, 455; IV, 12, 13). Curley contradicts the view that Spinoza ignored empirical research (Curley 1986a, 156), and indeed, Spinoza even demands a theory of experimentation (Spinoza 1985, 42). We also have evidence from his correspondence that Spinoza experimented himself.

But it is especially Leibniz’s modern concept of hypothesis that can explain the empirical project of rationalism. To recall, to state a hypothesis is to state the way of generation whereby the possibility of a thing can be proved. For Leibniz, this is even valid if parts of such a hypothesis cannot yet be perceived distinctly and can only be supposed, that is, if the hypothesis is a hybrid of causal definition and empirical facts. While such a hypothesis is valid only by presumption of the truth of our empirical knowledge, it has to be coherent in itself and can count as demonstrated to the extent it fulfills this criterion. If there exist competing hypotheses for the explanation of natural phenomena, as in the case of the hypotheses of Ptolemy, Tycho de Brahe, and Copernicus, one has to choose the most intelligible hypothesis as true or closest to truth, which also coheres the most with all known phenomena.

What is already implicit in the 1680s becomes plain in the 1690s, that truth for Leibniz is nothing but the intelligibility of a hypothesis, that is, a complex causal definition. Truth is nothing we can state by checking the correspondence of our ideas with reality, as claimed by empiricists. Such a check is indeed impossible. Instead, adequate ideas are true in themselves, and their truth can be determined alone by their own property to be free of contradiction. This alone makes them intelligible and thus possible. That is not only valid for mathematics, but as well for causal definitions or hypotheses about real things. Just as Hobbes had declared, Leibniz argues: All we can generate or cause, or of which we can provide a possible way of generation or causation, is intelligible and knowable by human beings in adequate ideas.

While today we are used to distinguishing between natural sciences as hard-core science (such as physics, chemistry, biology, or, increasingly, medicine), on the one hand, and humanities and social sciences, on the other, Hobbes, Spinoza, and Leibniz instead distinguished demonstrative from empirical knowledge. To the extent that empirical knowledge could be organized in explanatory and coherent hypotheses explaining natural phenomena by mathematical science, it could be turned into a gradually demonstrative science. For Leibniz, even human history and the humanities could be turned into sciences in this way, being not really different from natural sciences in their searching for a coherent explanation of empirical, contingent truths. As soon as they could come up with a theoretical framework of a priori eternal truths available to us through the Geometrical Method, they could become science.

5. Geometrical Method and Logic of Containment

Leibniz, embracing the Geometrical Method, was fully aware of his dangerous intellectual neighbors (Hobbes and Spinoza), and worked hard to secure his metaphysics against strict determinism or necessitarianism in order to distinguish his metaphysical and epistemological project from these bad bedfellows. He had been working on this since he studied Hobbes and Spinoza in Mainz between 1670 and 1672. The result is his well-known distinction of necessitating versus inclining in paragraph 13 of the Discourse on Metaphysics written in 1686 (Loemker 310-1; A VI, 4, N. 306, p. 1546). But, notwithstanding his obvious rejection of Hobbes’ and Spinoza’s strict determinism, Leibniz clearly shares the new Geometrical Method, as a philosophical method, with the infamous philosophers, the method which was constantly accused of necessitarianism if extended to real things. Moreover, it is this new method based on the causal definition that provides the basis of Leibniz’s logic of containment (Di Bella 2005, 80-95).

Leibniz approaches the challenge by distinguishing abstract and concrete things as subjects of our ideas. While only God can have a priori knowledge of the complete notions of concrete things or individuals, we can at least have a priori knowledge of abstracta as, for example, geometrical figures because they are finite in their properties. Also, what is true for one kind of abstracta, as for example a triangle, is true of all members of that kind, for example, for all triangles. In contrast, because concrete things or individuals have infinitely many properties and are the only member of their kind, we as finite beings cannot reach their complete concepts and have to rely on empirical knowledge too when it comes to individuals (Loemker 331-8; A II, 2, N. 14). This distinction, closely related to the distinction of necessary and contingent truths, allowed Leibniz to distinguish human and divine knowledge by a qualitative criterion. Moreover, it also provided a criterion to distinguish contingent from necessary knowledge, thereby paving the path for human and divine freedom. This solution gave Leibniz sufficient confidence to present at least the headings of his Discourse on Metaphysics to the Jansenist theologian and Cartesian Arnauld in 1686, with the long sec. 13 being especially provocative in respect to free will. Clearly, at this time, Leibniz had worked out his new metaphysics (based, however, on the problematic new Geometrical Method), which would make modern science compatible with Christian dogmatics and especially allow for free will by a softened determinism.

However, in spite of Leibniz’s strong emphasis on the different ontological status of abstracta versus concreta and of necessary versus contingent truths to secure contingency and to block strict determinism, he always maintained the containment theory based on Geometrical Method. According to this view, in every true proposition, the predicate had to be included in the subject. This position clearly retains a general similarity between the two kinds of concepts because both—specific (or full) concepts of finite abstract things as much as complete concepts of concrete infinite individuals—must include all their predicates and can be known a priori by Him who generated them. This view is precisely the core of the Geometrical Method! According to Leibniz, even if human beings cannot know individuals a priori but only through empirical study or by history, God does know the complete concepts of individual substances a priori which thus exist, the subject containing the predicate.

It was this theory that would lead to paragraph 13 of the Discourse of Metaphysics, according to which the complete concept of any individual was known by God and would include every single event that would ever happen to us. When God created this world, He chose those individuals who belonged to the best of all compossible worlds. Because of that choice, led by God’s intellect, there cannot be any contradiction among the things of one world, or rather of their concepts. What is crucial here is that Leibniz’s approach to contingent things assures us—from the very beginning—of the inner coherence of all phenomena of this world that will ever occur to our experience even if we cannot see it yet. Because there is nothing arbitrary in God’s creation—nihil sine ratione—we can take it for granted that there is a universal coherence of the world in spite of our own limited approach. It is within this view that Leibniz sharply deviates from Luther and the Protestant way of thinking in which such an intelligibility of the world to humans is bluntly denied, due to the fall. It is this view that makes him a true optimist, being convinced of the intelligibility of the world—even if we will never exhaust it.

6. The Mathematization of Nature as a Challenge of Necessitarianism

The use of the Geometrical Method in philosophy had often been criticized, long before Kant argued against it (Kant 1998, 630-43; 1^st Cr. A713/B741-A738/B766). One objection was that the Geometrical Method should be restricted to geometry and could not be used in any other field. At first glance, this seems quite convincing. Given the cumbersome outlook of a text written in Geometrical Method, as for example Spinoza’s Ethics, it seems obvious that this method makes understanding of the argument rather more difficult. The complicated system of references to former demonstrations constantly interrupts the argument; Spinoza’s addition of so many scholia wherein he explains the context and the aim of his demonstrations in common language displays his awareness of this problem.

But the objections against the Geometrical Method were more fundamental. What the partisans of the Geometrical Method saw as its greatest advantage in contrast to any other knowledge—the necessary conclusions and thus certainty, was considered the greatest danger by its critics. One of the reasons for such protests was obviously the theological concern about human haughtiness as it was expressed already in the accusation against Galileo. He was blamed for claiming an equality between human knowledge and that of God, at least in geometrical things (Galilei 1907, vol. 19, 326-7). Indeed, Galileo stated that what we could demonstrate geometrically could not be known any better by God because it was necessarily true: “I say that as to the truth of the knowledge which is given by mathematical proofs, this is the same that Divine wisdom recognizes” (Galilei 1967, 103; my emphasis-UG). The concern about human haughtiness was not restricted to the Catholic Church, it would also cause worries among Protestants, for example, for the Cambridge Platonists, very influential to Locke and Newton, who both rejected the Geometrical Method. In Germany, it became one of the major arguments of the Lutheran theologians and philosophers against Leibniz and Christian Wolff (Goldenbaum 2004, 48-58; 195-208).

But it was not the traditional method of Euclidian geometry that caused the massive criticism of the new Geometrical Method. Rather it was its close connection to the mathematization of nature and thereby the extension of geometry from a small discipline without practical relevance to reality, making it the science of the world. Galileo had opened the new path of modern science by using the Geometrical Method for the investigation of physical phenomena, and he was deeply convinced that nature itself is structured mathematically. In this way, he found the law of falling bodies as well as the parabola as the trajectory of thrown bodies; neither of them could have been found by mere observation or experiment. Galileo’s enthusiasm that mathematics would allow us to understand the inner structures of nature is most clearly expressed in his famous saying:

Philosophy is written in that great book which ever is before our eyes—I mean the universe—but we cannot understand it if we do not first learn the language and grasp the symbols in which it is written. The book is written in mathematical language, and the symbols are triangles, circles and other geometrical figures, without whose help it is impossible to comprehend a single word of it; without which one wanders in vain through a dark labyrinth. (Galileo 1960, 183-4)

Descartes followed Galileo and asked for the cultivation of a new sort of geometry that would no longer be a mere abstract enterprise but could explain the phenomena of nature (AT II, 268; CSMK III, 118-9). There shall be only one science, mathesis universalis, by which the observed natural phenomena could be explained from their inner essences and thus necessarily. The great admirer of Galileo, Thomas Hobbes, extended the Geometrical Method to politics, claiming that his political philosophy was the beginning of political science. Spinoza even extended the Geometrical Method to ethics and delivered a theory of human affects showing the necessity by which they would occur whenever certain circumstances came together. That is how he could state: “Therefore, I shall treat the nature and powers of the Affects, and the power of the Mind over them, by the same Method by which, in the proceding parts, I treated God and the Mind, and I shall consider human actions and appetites just as if it were a Question of lines, planes, and bodies” (C 492; Preface to EIII).

All these thinkers extended the Geometrical Method beyond mathematics, claiming its value for the investigation of realia, of real things instead of mere geometrical figures. Such extension of the Geometrical Method to real things was done with the goal to produce certainty of knowledge, a certainty guaranteed by the necessity of geometrical demonstrations. But if it would indeed lead to necessary demonstrations about nature, politics, and ethics, it would introduce necessitarianism into natural, social, and moral sciences, and space would not be left for miracles and, even worse, for free will. This can be seen in the cases of Hobbes and Spinoza, who both were strict determinists. In contrast, it was precisely the recognition of this threat of determinism or necessitarianism implied in the Geometrical Method that led Henry More very early to his criticism of Descartes and since the 1660s to his massive rejection of Cartesianism (More 1711, 58). Besides the theological concern about human haughtiness, it was the threat of necessitarianism that was the true source of the lasting protest against the Geometrical Method throughout the 17th and 18th centuries.

What caused the most trouble about the Geometrical Method in 17th and throughout the 18th centuries was neither its ponderous way of thinking nor its lack of success. Rather it was the turmoil about human haughtiness and the threat that its determinism would destroy free will of God as well as that of human beings. Exemplary for the different approaches to God’s free will is still the correspondence of Leibniz and Clarke. According to Leibniz, nothing can happen without a sufficient reason—and this just proves the existence of a God who—in His perfection—could not have chosen an arbitrarily functioning world. Clarke (and Newton), on the other hand, counts any act of an arbitrary will on God’s part as a sufficient reason (Leibniz 2000, 7 and 11).

7. Conclusion

Two things caused deep anxiety and anger regarding this method: (1) the attempt to extend the Geometrical Method to nature, to humans, and to society (taking mathematization of nature for granted), providing human beings with a godlike a priori knowledge beyond mathematics, even if limited; and (2) the threat of determinism. These threats forced theologians and Christian philosophers to reject rationalism and the Geometrical Method altogether. In sharp contrast to rationalism, Locke would even deny the possibility of any natural science because we could not have any real definitions beyond mathematics and morals:

This way of getting and improving our Knowledge in Substances only by Experience and History, which is all the weakness of our Faculties in this State of Mediocrity, which we are in this World, can attain to, makes me suspect, that natural Philosophy is not capable of being made a Science. We are able, I imagine, to reach very little general Knowledge concerning the Species of Bodies, and their several Properties. (Locke 1975, 645; Leibniz 1996, 453; IV, 12, 10)

Kant would declare that there would “never be a Newton for a blade of grass” (Kant 2000, 268-71; 3^rd Crit., 75 (B338)), pointing us instead to design theory in biology admitting causal explanations alone for mathematics and mechanics, that is, applied mathematics. Both approaches were applauded by Protestant theology (Goldenbaum 2004, 48-58).

Thus, the opposition between the two philosophical camps of rationalism and empiricism was not the result of different approaches to experience as is often claimed. Rather, it was their different and opposing stances toward the Geometrical Method and the mathematization of nature. This new Geometrical Method was in no way a merely external way of presentation to rationalist philosophy. Instead, it constituted this philosophy. As much as rationalist philosophers differ in their philosophical systems, they all agree that human beings can arrive at a priori knowledge (through deducing from definitions), independently of experience, and that this knowledge is somehow “divine,” that is, as certain as God’s knowledge. In contrast, empiricists and theologians are eager to deny such a possibility. Thus, it is the Geometrical Method that provides the explanation for the two schools of early modern philosophy.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Abbreviations

A
- See Leibniz 1921ff.
AT
- See Descartes 1996.
CSM
- See Descartes 1985-88.
Loemker
- See Leibniz 1969.
Leibniz-Clarke
- See Leibniz 2000.
OL
- See Hobbes 1839.

b. Bibliography

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Breger, Herbert (1991), “Der mechanizistische Denkstil in der Mathematik des 17.Jahrhunderts,” in: Hartmut Hecht (Ed.), Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz im Philosophischen Diskurs über Geometrie und Erfahrung, Akademie Verlag, 15-46.
Breger, Herbert (2008), “Leibniz’s Calculation with Compendia,” in: Ursula Goldenbaum/Douglas Jesseph, Infinitesimal Differences. Controversies between Leibniz and His Contemporaries, De Gruyter: Berlin-New York, pp. 185-198.
Cassirer, Ernst (1974), Das Erkenntnisproblem in der Philosophie und Wissenschaft der neueren Zeit, 4 vols., Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft: Darmstadt.
Corr, Charles A. (1972), “Christian Wolff’s Treatment of Scientific Discovery,” in: Journal of the History of Philosophy, 10, pp. 323-334.
Curley, Edwin (1986a), “Spinoza’s Geometric Method,” in: Studia Spinozana 2, Central Theme: Spinoza’s Epistemology, ed. by E. Curley, W. Klever, F. Mignini, Walther & Walther: Alling 1986, pp. 152-169.
Curley, Edwin (1986b), Behind the Geometrical Method, Princeton University Press.
De Dijn, Hermann (1986), “Conceptions of Philosophical Method in Spinoza: Logica and Mos Geometricus,” in: The Review of Metaphysics, XL, No. 1, Issue No. 157 (Sep), pp. 55-78.
Descartes, René (1985-88), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, trans. by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, New York, 3 vols.
Descartes, René (1996), Oeuvres de Descartes, ed. by Charles Adam & Paul Tannery, Librarie Philosophique J. Vrin: Paris, 11 vols.
Di Bella, Stefano (2005), The Science of the Individual: Leibniz’s Ontology of Individual Substance, Dordrecht.
Galilei, Galileo (1907), Opere. Edizione Nazionale, vol. 19, ed. by Antonio Favaro, Firenze: Barbèra.
Galilei, Galileo (1954), Dialogues Concerning Two New Sciences, trans. by Henry Crew & Alfons de Salvio, introd. By Antonio Favaro, Dover Publications: New York.
Galilei, Galileo (1960), “The Assayer,” in: Stilman Drake and C.D. O’Malley, The Controversy on the Comets of 1618, University of Pennsylvania Press: Philadelphia.
Galilei, Galileo (1967), Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems (2nd edition), trans. by Stillman Drake, University of California Press: Berkeley.
Goldenbaum, Ursula (1991), “Daß die Phänomene mit der Vernunft Übereinstimmen sollen. Spinozas Versuch einer Vermittlung von geometrischer Theorie und experimenteller Erfahrung,” in: Leibniz im philosophischen Diskurs über Geometrie und Erfahrung. Studien zur Ausarbeitung des Erfahrungsbegriffes in der neuzeitlichen Philosophie, ed. by Hartmut Hecht, Akademie Verlag: Berlin 1991, pp. 86-104.
Goldenbaum, Ursula (2004), Appell an das Publikum. Die öffentliche Debatte in der deutschen Aufklärung 1697-1786. Sieben Fallstudien, 2 Parts, Akademie Verlag: Berlin.
Goldenbaum, Ursula (2011), “Spinoza—ein toter Hund? Nicht für Christian Wolff,” in: Zeitschrift für Ideengeschichte, ed. by Johannes Ulrich Schneider, pp. 29-41.
Hobbes, Thomas (1839), Opera Philosophica quae latine scripsit omnia, ed. by Gulielmi Molesworth, Bohn: London.
Hobbes, Thomas (1994), Leviathan, with selected variants from the Latin edition of 1668, ed. by Edwin Curley, Hackett: Indianapolis.
Hubbeling, Hubertus Gesinus (1964), Spinoza’s Methodology, Van Gorcum: Assen.
Hubbeling, Hubertus Gesinus (1977), “The development of Spinoza’s axiomatic (geometric) method: The reconstructed geometric proof of the second letter of Spinoza’s correspondence and its relation to earlier and later versions,” in: Revue international de philosophie 31, pp. 53-68.
Jesseph, Douglas (1999), Squaring the Circle: The War between Hobbes and Wallis, Chicago Press: Chicago and London.
Kant, Immanuel (1998), Critique of Pure Reason, trans. and ed. by Paul Geyer and Allen W. Wood, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, New York.
Kant , Immanuel (2000), Critique of the Power of Judgment, ed. by Paul Guyer, trans. by Paul Guyer and Eric Mathews, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge and New York.
Klever, Wim (1986), “Axioms in Spinoza’s Science and Philosophy of Science,” in: Studia Spinozana 2, Central Theme: Spinoza’s Epistemology, ed. by E. Curley, W. Klever, F. Mignini, Walther & Walther: Alling 1986, pp. 171-195.
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm (1921ff.), Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, Akademie Verlag: Berlin (quoted as A with Roman number of series and Arabic number of volume, followed by page number).
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm (1969), Philosophical Papers and Letters, trans. and ed. by Leroy E. Loemker, Reidel: Dordrecht.
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm (1996), New Essays on Human Understanding, trans. and ed. by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, New York.
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm/Samuel Clarke (2000), Correspondence, ed. by Roger Ariew, Hackett: Indianapolis.
Locke, John (1975), An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, ed. by Peter H. Nidditch, Oxford University Press.
Matheron, Alexandre (1986), “Spinoza and Euclidean Arithmetic: The Example of the Fourth Proportional,” (trans. by David Lachterman), in: Spinoza and the Sciences, ed. by Marjorie Greene and Debra Nails, Reidel: Dordrecht, pp. 125-50.
Maxwell, Vance (1988), “The Philosophical Method of Spinoza,” in: Dialogue 27 (1988), pp. 89-110.
More, Henry (1711), Epistola H. Mori ad V.C., quae Apologiam complectitur pro Cartesio, quaeque Introductionis loco esse poterit ad universam Philosophiam Cartesianam, 4^th ed., Londini.
Pascal, Blaise (2000), Œuvres completes, ed. by Michel le Guern, Gallimard: Paris, vol. II.
Schüling, Hermann (1969), Die Geschichte der axiomatischen Methode im 16. und beginnenden 17. Jahrhundert, Olms: Hildesheim, New York.
Spinoza (1744), B.v.S. Sittenlehre widerleget von dem berühmten Weltweisen unserer Zeit Herrn Christian Wolff, Varrentrapp: Frankfurt and Leipzig [Reprint: Hildesheim and New York: Olms 1981].
Spinoza (1985), The Collected Works of Spinoza, ed. and trans. by Edwin Curley, Princeton University Press.
Wolff, Christian (1734), A Discovery of the True Cause of the Wonderful Multiplication of Corn; With Some General Remarks upon the Nature of Trees and Plants, Printed for J. Roberts: London.
Wolff, Christian (1980), Gesammelte Werke, 1. Abt., Vol. 10, Olms: Hildesheim, New York.

Author Information

Ursula Goldenbaum
Email: ugolden@emory.edu
Emory University
U. S. A.

Phenomenological Psychology

Phenomenological psychology is the use of the phenomenological method to gain insights regarding topics related to psychology. Though researchers and thinkers throughout the history of philosophy have identified their work as contributing to phenomenological psychology, how people understand phenomenological psychology is a matter of some controversy. On the one hand, in light of contemporary philosophy’s affirmation of qualia as non-reducible, some understand phenomenological psychology to be merely a method for understanding subjective experience. When phenomenological psychology is understood this way, clarification is usually sought in terms such as “introspection” and “psychologism.” Put as a question, are the research methods identified as phenomenological and used in psychology ultimately the formalization of methods for gathering and preserving data regarding merely the subjective experience of (subjective and objective) events?

On the other hand, phenomenological psychology refers to the use of phenomenology to study the necessary and universal structures of experience. In this way, phenomenological psychology is grounded in transcendental analysis as a research method which analyzes the necessary conditions for the possibility of human experience. Whereas according to the former understanding, the results of such research supposedly have minimal to no universal generalizability, the latter understanding speaks of a cognitional structure universally generalizable to the human species. This article discusses the nature and history of phenomenological psychology, addressing the above distinct understandings of phenomenology as applied to psychology and the distinction between phenomenological and naturalistic psychology.

What is Phenomenology?
What is Psychology?
Which Husserl? Whose Phenomenology?
1. Husserl’s Five Different Introductions to Phenomenology
2. Husserl’s Three Different Ways to Phenomenological Reduction
Phenomenological Psychology as a Science
Phenomenological Psychology as the Analytic of Ontic Dasein
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. What is Phenomenology?

a. Method vs. Movement

Phenomenology may be understood as a method for investigating the cognitional structure of experience or as a movement in the history of philosophy. Given the heterodoxy of approaches and emphases in the history of philosophy to phenomenology, formal explications of phenomenology usually resist speaking as if “phenomenology” refers to a unified “school” of thought. Yet, when considered as a movement in the history of philosophy, Edmund Husserl (1859-1938) is identified as the founder of phenomenology, and when considered as a method Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) is identified as the progenitor of phenomenology.

It has become customary when discussing the origin of the term “phenomenology,” to refer to Christoph Friedrich Oetinger’s (compare Kant, 1900) 1762 use of the term and to invoke, following Martin Heidegger, a reference to Johann H. Lambert’s 1764 New Organon (Neues Organon) from where it appears Kant obtained the term. In a 1770 correspondence with Lambert, the outline of Kant’s appropriation of the term into the Critique of Pure Reason can already be seen. According to Kant,

The most universal laws of sensibility play an unjustifiably large role in metaphysics, where, after all, it is merely concepts and principles of pure reason that are at issue. It seems to me a quite particular, although merely negative science, general phenomenology (phaenomenologia generalis), must precede metaphysics. In it the principles of sensibility, their validity and their limitations, would be determined, so that these principles could not be confusedly applied to objects of pure reason (Kant, 1986, p. 59, translation slightly modified; compare Heidegger, 2005, p. 3).

Two pieces are of the utmost importance in this passage from Kant. First, Kant makes a distinction between the impure and the pure use of reason. Impure reason refers to the a priori aspects of experience, and these aspects are universal within the human experience. Further, impure reason is differentiated from pure reason insofar as impure reason includes what Kant in the above passage calls “sensibility.” Hence, “phenomenology,” for Kant, should be understood as the “science” that studies the aspects universal to human experience.

The second important piece of the Kant passage is his explicit description of phenomenology as determining the “principles of sensibility.” Here, “principle” should be understood in terms of the structural origins of human experience. In other words, Kant understands the principles of sensibility to belong to the order of necessary and universal conditions of human experience, a.k.a. the “structure of experience.” Already in this earliest definition by Kant, phenomenology pertains to human experience and, thereby, takes the first-person perspective of some subject as a point of departure. However, because phenomenology studies the universal and necessary aspects of such experience, it is neither merely subjective, nor concerned with a particular psychological subject.

G.W.F. Hegel inherited this understanding of phenomenology from Kant. According to Joseph Kockelmans, “it was only with Hegel that a well-defined technical meaning became attached” to the term phenomenology. For “Hegel, phenomenology was not knowledge of the Absolute-in-and-for-itself, in the spirit of Fichte or Schelling, but in his Phenomenology of Spirit [(Phänomenologie des Geistes)] he wanted to solely consider knowledge as it appears to consciousness” (Kockelmans, 1967, p. 24). Further, beyond the emergence of the term “phenomenology” in the eighteenth century, Heidegger traces its etymology to the terms phainomenon and logos in Aristotle, especially Book II of De Anima (On the Soul), where Aristotle discusses “seeing” (compare Heidegger, 2005, pp. 3-18).

It was not until the twentieth century, however, that a phenomenological “movement” is identified in the history of philosophy (compare Spiegelberg, 1965). Though Husserl is identified as the founder of this movement, the perplexities involved in understanding this movement as unified are discussed below. What is clear is that Husserl’s initial formulation of phenomenology was influenced by Franz Brentano (1838-1917). Not only is Brentano credited with identifying “intentionality” as the mark of the mental, at the University of Vienna “in his lectures on Descriptive Psychology (1889), Brentano employed the phrase ‘descriptive psychology or descriptive phenomenology’ to differentiate” a descriptive science of the mental “from genetic or physiological psychology” (Moran, 2000, p. 8). However, in what will be a central and career-long concern for Husserl, a descriptive phenomenology or psychology must avoid psychologism.

Though what is meant by psychologism is discussed below, it may be simply understood as the attempt to make objective reality depend upon the psychological features of some subject. For example, on the one hand, though some thing may be experienced differently by different humans, it is still the case that there is some thing to be experienced. That means it is not the case that the thing would be there for some humans and not for others. On the other hand, despite differences across human subjects (for example color blindness, mental illness, habitual tendencies) there are objective aspects of the experience of a thing which are universalizable across humans. Hence, phenomenology is not concerned with the non-universalizable.

b. Avoiding Psychologism

Though Husserl identifies more than one kind of psychologism, a characterization of Husserl’s phenomenology, insofar as it is an attempt to avoid psychologism, in general is possible. Psychologism for Husserl is a kind of relativism. In the two volume set titled Logical Investigations (1900-1901), which Husserl identified as his entry into phenomenology, psychologism is the theme of the entire first volume. There he notes, “Psychologism in all its subvarieties and individual elaborations is … relativism” (Husserl, 2001a, p. 82).

Generally stated, objective aspects of human experience are “psychologized” when “their objective sense, their sense as a species of objects having a peculiar essence, is denied in favor of the subjective mental occurrences, the data in immanent or psychological temporality” (Husserl, 1969, p. 169). According to Husserl, “the expression psychologism” applies to “any interpretation which converts objectivities into something psychological in the proper sense” (Husserl, 1969, p. 169; compare Hopkins, 2006). This is to say, that at any moment of some human subject’s experience the content of that moment may be differentiated between the objective and subjective aspects of the experience, and one is guilty of psychologism when one treats the objective (universalizable) aspects of the experience as if they are merely subjective. Though different subjects have different perspectives, to claim the reality of a situation is not universally true because it rather depends on the subjective determination of subjects is to be guilty of psychologism.

Husserl’s phenomenology, even his “descriptive” phenomenology, may be characterized as an attempt to avoid psychologism. In the second volume of Logical Investigations Husserl identifies the “exclusive concern” of phenomenology as

experiences intuitively seizable and analyzable in the pure generality of their essence, not experiences empirically perceived and treated as real facts, as experiences of human or animal experients in the phenomenal world that we posit as an empirical fact. This phenomenology must bring to pure expression, must describe in terms of their essential concepts and their governing formulae of essence, the essences which directly make themselves known in intuition, and the connections which have their roots purely in such essences. Each such statement of essence is an a priori statement in the highest sense of the word (Husserl, 2001b, p. 86).

Understanding Husserl’s phenomenology as engaged in a “war” (Husserl, 1969, p. 172) on psychologism helps clarify the actual relation between the various phenomenological psychology approaches to subjective experience and, at least, Husserl’s phenomenology, if not the “phenomenology movement” itself.

Not only is Husserl’s statement above helpful toward getting a sense of the theme of Husserl’s philosophy, it also invokes the important role of the a priori in his understanding of phenomenology. Contents of experience derived from the senses, that is the a posteriori, cannot provide universal and necessary knowledge. Similarly, “empiricism expressly teaches” “more or less vague probabilities resting on experience and induction, concerned with matters of fact in the life of man” (Husserl, 2001a, p. 56). Hence, Husserl’s concern to uncover the universal and necessary, that is the a priori, conditions of possible experience reveals a deep kinship with Kant’s critical philosophy generally, and specifically his Critique of Pure Reason (compare Kant, 1998; compare Allison, 1975; compare Heidegger, 1997).

This kinship is already indicated in the understanding of phenomenology as a method, often referred to as “transcendental analysis” or simply “phenomenology,” and Kant as the progenitor of this method. Yet, some phenomenological psychologists are still reluctant to acknowledge the value of Kant, though Husserl himself eventually affirmed the primacy of Kant’s thinking in such statements as the following: “The proof of this idealism is therefore phenomenology itself. Only someone who misunderstands either the deepest sense of intentional method, or that of transcendental reduction, or perhaps both, can attempt to separate phenomenology from transcendental idealism” (Husserl, 1999, p. 86). As an example, then, of someone who takes the method over the movement reading of phenomenology, Tom Rockmore in his Kant and Phenomenology provides a cogent characterization. According to Rockmore, Husserl “believed that he invented phenomenology and that earlier efforts, notably in Hegel, whom he seems to have known little about, but whom he criticized, were not significant” (Rockmore, 2011, p. 101). However, Rockmore goes further to explain,

Husserl depends on Kant in a number of ways: for example, his concern for philosophy as a rigorous science, his conception of phenomenology as transcendental idealism, the relation of transcendental phenomenology to the life-world, and, above all, the problem of psychologism. This problem, which arises in Kant’s criticism of Lockean so-called physiology, leads to a conception of the subject as a later version of the Kantian transcendental unity of apperception running through Husserl’s positon from beginning to end (Rockmore, 2011, p. 101).

Rather than address each of these aspects in Husserl’s phenomenology that are indebted to Kant, a brief discussion of “transcendental analysis”, combined with the above discussion of “psychologism,” should provide a sufficient base with which to grasp the following discussion of phenomenological psychology.

c. Transcendental Analysis and Attitude

How then, is “transcendental analysis” to be understood? In From Kant to Davidson, Andrew Carpenter concisely suggests, “Kant’s transcendental strategy involved investigating the necessary conditions for the possibility of experience” (Carpenter, 2003, p. 219). Carpenter then indicates three requirements. Firstly, “Identifying a phenomenon that one’s interlocutors agree exists.” Secondly, “Investigating the necessary conditions for the possibility of that phenomenon” (Carpenter, 2003, p. 219). Thirdly, “Examining the philosophical implications of the resulting ‘transcendental analysis’ of the possibility of the phenomenon [emphasis added]” (Carpenter, 2003, p. 219). This characterization correctly emphasizes transcendental analysis as a method with which to arrive at not the subjective characters of a phenomenon, but the necessary conditions for a phenomenon. Moreover, this characterization correctly illustrates the nature of the method of phenomenology, as transcendental analysis, by indicating the intermediate position of the method’s results. In other words, phenomenological disclosure of the conditions for the possibility of phenomena allows for a subsequent deeper understanding and discussion of the conditions.

This last insight, namely that the phenomenological method provides access to the necessary, and human species universal, a priori conditions for the possibility of experience, helps to contextualize Max Scheler’s (1874-1928) characterization of the “phenomenological attitude.” According to Scheler, phenomenology “is the name of an attitude of spiritual seeing in which one can see or experience something which otherwise remains hidden” (Scheler, 1973, p. 137). Then, understanding phenomenology as either a movement or method, it may also be understood as an “attitude.” Since a “method is a goal-directed procedure of thinking about facts, for example, induction or deduction” or “a particular procedure of observation and investigation, with or without experiment and with or without instrumental support for our senses, in the form of microscopes, telescopes, etc.” Scheler argues “Phenomenology, however, has a fundamentally different attitude. That which is seen and experienced is given only in the seeing and experiencing act itself … It does not simply stand there and let itself be observed” (Scheler, 1973, pp. 137-138). Hence, “attitude” refers to the relation to a phenomenon which allows it to show itself as itself (compare Heidegger, 1962, p. 51), when to a different attitude it would have shown itself differently. That the phenomenological attitude has the character of a science is ensured by the universality and necessity of what shows itself to observers who have gained such a relation to phenomena.

As the remaining sections explicate more fully, the discussion so far may already allow for a preliminary understanding of how phenomenology may be thought of as a descriptive psychology, and how a descriptive psychology may be understood as a phenomenological psychology. Whether considered as a movement, method, or attitude, phenomenology is understood to involve observation of phenomena yielding results of a specific kind. What is at stake, then, for observational research to be identified as phenomenological psychology, will involve the kind of results the research seeks to yield. Contextualizing phenomenological psychology as such, despite the claims of researchers from diverse movements utilizing diverse methods and with various attitudes to be engaged in some type of “phenomenology,” will help clarify whether such research is truly “phenomenological” psychology.

Consider that according to Aron Gurwitsch (1901-1973), “Husserl once referred to” Dorion Cairns (1901-1973) as “the future of phenomenology” in America, and as professor of philosophy and psychology and “arguably Husserl’s closest continuer” Cairns claimed, “It is an historical fact that Husserl’s investigations of subjectivity always had a philosophical goal. Their primary goal was never psychological. The results of his investigations can nevertheless be interpreted psychologically, as he himself indicated” (Cairns, 2010, pp. 1-2). Further, “A psychological interpretation of Husserl’s results is a simplification. The most abstruse of his methodological theories, the theory of transcendental-phenomenological reduction, is disregarded when his results are interpreted psychologically” (Cairns, 2010, p. 2). Yet, Cairns wavered, this should not stop “the psychologist who wants to discover in Husserl’s writings whatever is relevant to psychology as a natural science” (Cairns, 2010, p. 2).

2. What is Psychology?

a. Natural Science vs. Human Science

It is helpful to give a brief statement regarding the meaning of “psychology,” in order to understand to what “phenomenological psychology” is supposed to refer. Of all the many distinctions by which the science of psychology may be sub-divided, the distinction between psychology as a natural and as a non-natural science retains priority. This distinction may be seen throughout the entire history of philosophy and psychology (compare Brennan, 2002). Namely, the distinction is that between psychology as a natural science and psychology as a human science (compare Van Kaam, 1966).

Generally stated, psychology as a natural science seeks to account for psychological phenomena as natural phenomena, and psychology as a human science seeks to account for psychological phenomena as human, social, and cultural phenomena. Whereas the methods of psychology as a natural science tend toward those found in biology, chemistry or physics, the methods of psychology as a human science tend toward those found in history, sociology, and anthropology. There is currently a good deal of debate regarding whether phenomenology should be considered only a method viable for psychology as a human science or as both a human and natural science. Hence, how phenomenological psychology is to be understood is a matter of some controversy.

It is, therefore, insufficient to simply suggest, along with the Oxford Encyclopedia of Psychology, that “The term phenomenological is often used by psychologists to refer simply to the subjective point of view” (Kazdin, 2000, p. 162). On one hand, phenomenological analysis proper seeks the universal and necessary conditions for the possibility of human experiential phenomena. On the other hand, there is a paradigm for research in psychology as a natural science that seeks to isolate subjective phenomena, for example qualia, for example,, for the sake of discovering a correlation with natural phenomena such as electro-chemical activity of the central nervous system. Despite a departure from phenomenology proper, phenomenological psychology still refers, though ambiguously, to meaningful research projects; however, the specific difference between phenomenological and non-phenomenological projects in psychology is not “simply” “the subjective point of view” (compare Husserl, 1977, pp. 110-115).

b. Naturalistic vs. Personalistic Standpoint

Husserl was aware of the different approaches to psychology as a science, and though subjective phenomena qua subjective, as both Husserl and Cairns above explained, are not properly “phenomenological,” there is a distinction from Husserl’s work which may help further clarify the meaning of phenomenological psychology. In Book II of Husserl’s Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy, he characterizes both of these approaches to psychology as depending upon two different types of the specific, and properly, phenomenological-transcendental attitude. In other words, this is his distinction between a “naturalistic attitude” and a “personalistic attitude.” Husserl notes phenomenologists can move “quite effortlessly, from one attitude into another, from the naturalistic into the personalistic, and as to the respective sciences, from the natural sciences into the human sciences” (Husserl, 2000, p. 190). Moreover, the personalistic attitude is “the attitude we are always in when we live with one another, talk to one another, shake hands with one another…” (Husserl, 2000, p. 192).

At this point, a number of different ways to identify generally the relation between psychology and phenomenology are available. Firstly, some part or portion of psychology may be seen as the study of merely subjective phenomena, and such a psychology would, thereby, incorrectly be called “phenomenological” in the proper philosophical sense. Moreover, even if subjective concerns in psychology are not the results of introspection, they pertain exclusively to empirical phenomena and would not be properly “phenomenological.” Secondly, the topics and themes of psychology may be seen as resulting from an attitude between a natural attitude and the properly phenomenological-transcendental attitude. In this way, the study of such topics and themes should lead ultimately to consideration of the transcendental features involved. Thirdly, psychology as a whole may be divided into the different attitudes of the naturalistic and personalistic with research in psychology as a natural science and as a human science resulting from these, respectively, and with both attitudes subordinated to the properly phenomenological attitude (compare Husserl, 1977, p. 166). Notice, in this way all phenomena, as phenomena of human experience, fall within the scope of phenomenology proper; however, it points to a significant confusion on the part of the psychologist when the non-universal, non-necessary aspects of the phenomena are taken as the features to be studied through phenomenological science. Hence, it is as if these three general identifications relate to one another circularly, since failure to accomplish the transcendental-phenomenological viewpoint of the third may place the psychologist, studying merely subjective phenomena, back at the first.

c. Elimination vs. Reduction vs. Supervenience

From the properly phenomenological perspective of the third general identification, then, the following comments by Kant and Husserl are understood more easily. Kant famously argued in the Preface to his Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science that empirical psychology can never be a proper natural science (Kant, 2004, p. 7). For Kant, the naturalization of psychology suggests a denial of free will in humans, a position his philosophy fundamentally rejects. Similarly Husserl complained, “What is needed is a new ‘psychology’ of an essentially different type, a universal science of the spirit that is neither ‘psychophysical’ nor natural-scientific” (Husserl, 2000, p. 181; compare Husserl, 1970).

Yet, as indicated with the primary division of psychology into natural and human science, psychology tends to take a psychophysical understanding of human being as a point of departure for further research (compare [../hard-con/]). In fact, psychologists may be classified by a taxonomy of relations between the psychological and the physical. There are those who seek an elimination of either the psychological or the physical in favor of the other, and there are a number of ways to take up such a position. However, the most popular of such ways today is, perhaps, “eliminative materialism” (compare Churchland, 1981). Next, there are those who seek a reduction of either one of the psychological, or the physical, to the other. Though, again, it seems more popular and plausible today to find the reduction of the psychological to the physical advocated. Lastly, there are those who seek to characterize the relation in terms of supervenience. The perhaps most popular articulation suggests that psychological states cannot be eliminated in favor of, or reduced to, physical states; however, there can be no changes to psychological states without there being accompanying changes to physical states (compare Kim, 1984; compare Kim, 1987).

Exemplified by his books Mind in a Physical World (1998) and Physicalism, Or Something Near Enough (2005), Jaegwon Kim arrives at a position which privileges the physical over the psychological, while characterizing the relation between the two as one of “conditional functional reduction.” Now, to say that some mental property is “functionalizable” is to say that its presence as a property of consciousness can be associated with the function it serves regarding the physical environment. Hence, though Kim affirms the irreducibility of the qualitative phenomenal properties (qualia) of consciousness to physical properties, there is a conditional reduction of qualia to the functional role they play regarding the organism’s adaptation to the environment. Insofar as these positions regarding the psychophysical constitution of human beings indicate the context of the elements involved in research identified as within phenomenological psychology, and with the avowed goal of “naturalizing” the phenomenology of qualia, (compare Varela, 1992) how might Husserl see such research projects?

To sketch a brief response to this question, beyond the gestures already made above (for example, the third general identification of phenomenological psychology), consider the following comments from a section titled “The delimitation of somatology and psychology” in Book III of Ideas. According to Husserl,

What one has here, from the point of view of natural science, is a number of individual human beings each with a particular consciousness, a particular psyche … belonging to each. In the psycho-physical interrelated context that is made possible by the material interrelations of the animate organisms, there arise in the individual psyches acts that are intentionally directed at something psychically external. But what appears here is always only new states of the individual psyches (Husserl, 1980, p. 18).

Later in the same book, Husserl clarifies,

As we know, there come continually into consideration in the phenomenological exploration of the acts both consciousness itself and the correlate of consciousness, noesis and noema. To describe and determine according to essence the phenomenon of intuition of a physical thing … is at the same time also to keep in mind that the act in itself is the “meaning” of something and that what is meant as such is “physical thing.” But to substantiate this, indeed, to make what is meant as physical thing as such, namely as correlate (something perceived as such with regard to the perception, something named as such with regard to the naming), the object of research … that is not to explore physical things, physical things as such. A “physical thing” as correlate is not a physical thing; therefore the quotation marks (Husserl, 1980, p. 72).

Simply put, “one must not confuse noema (correlate) and essence” (Husserl, 1980, p. 73). Wherever we go, we bring the necessary and universal conditions for the possibility of experience to our experiences. Both the naturalization project and the merely subjective point of view project are misidentified with phenomenological psychology, considering phenomenology proper; moreover, both of these projects may fail at avoiding psychologism (compare Husserl, 2001b, p. 86, quoted above; compare Husserl, 1977, p. 38).

3. Which Husserl? Whose Phenomenology?

a. Husserl’s Five Different Introductions to Phenomenology

As David Carr discusses in his “Translator’s Introduction” to Husserl’s The Crisis of the European Science and Transcendental Phenomenology: An Introduction to Phenomenological Philosophy, Husserl produced a number of different “introductions” to phenomenology. However, as the above discussion of the progressive movement to transcendental phenomenology shows, there is a continuity to be discerned across the introductions (compare McKenna, 1982). Yet, at the same time, Husserl’s continued attempt to “introduce” phenomenology is widely seen as contributing to the controversy regarding the meaning of the term “phenomenology” itself (compare Spiegelberg, 1965). As Rockmore put it, “Husserl’s unconvincing claim to have invented phenomenology, which he struggles to define in a long series of texts, leaves both the meaning of the term, the genesis of the approach, and its import unresolved” (Rockmore, 2011, p. 191). According to Carr, Husserl attempts an introduction to phenomenology in all of the following books: Logical Investigations (1900); Ideas (1913); Formal and Transcendental Logic (1929); Cartesian Meditations (1931); The Crisis of the European Sciences (1937).

Further, as William McKenna mentions in his Husserl’s “Introductions to Phenomenology” and Iso Kern explicates in his article, “The Three Ways to the Transcendental Phenomenological Reduction,” these five books point to three ways to the much-discussed phenomenological reduction . Iso Kern, following and clarifying Hans-Georg Gadamer, indicates a “Cartesian way,” a way through “intentional psychology,” and a way through “ontology” into the “transcendental phenomenological reduction” (Kern, 1977, p. 126). Kern suggests these three ways are “not always sharply and clearly separated” in Husserl’s work. These ways may be seen as responses to questions such as “Through which steps in thinking does philosophic cognition arise?” and “How does knowing emerge from the aphilosophical life and become genuinely philosophical?” (Kern, 1977, p. 126).

b. Husserl’s Three Different Ways to Phenomenological Reduction

Since each of the ways explained by Kern are ways into the transcendental phenomenological attitude, only their differences will be briefly characterized here. The characterization of their differences is helpful toward clarifying what is meant by phenomenological psychology. This is because across the differing introductions, it is not difficult to lose sight of the many different unifying themes with which to coherently understand the relation between phenomenology and psychology. The key is to see that the introductions, rather than being set against one another, should be unified around Husserl’s attempts to instruct readers into the transcendental phenomenological attitude.

The Cartesian way seeks an absolute starting point from which philosophy may be understood as a science. This starting point demands absolute evidence, and this means simply clear and distinct evidence that cannot be doubted. Belief in the mind-external world is then to be doubted, since there is supposed to be no absolute evidence for belief in the mind-external world. Yet, knowledge about the world is based on belief in the world’s existence, and experience of what was previously believed to be the world does not cease when belief in the world is doubted. Hence, this relation to the experience of the “world,” is a reduced relation. The final step in the Cartesian way is to understand the intentional relation to the “world” as that of the “cogito,” that is the intentionality of the acting ego, such that the cogito provides absolute evidence for itself as the starting point for philosophy understood as a science. Notice, phenomenology involves understanding how the intentional structure of the subject provides objective knowledge of the mind-external world, and as such phenomenology’s interest in the intentional structure of the subject is not “subjective.”

The way through “intentional psychology,” then, according to Kern, takes the “physical sciences, which are interested purely in the physical and abstracts, from everything psychic. In opposition to these sciences, Husserl conceives the idea of a complementary science which is interested purely in the psychic and abstracts from everything physical” (compare Kern, 1977, p. 134). By pointing out that relations between objects in the lived experience of humans are not relations between those objects in mind-external reality, Husserl points the way to “lived experience.” This may be compared to the focus on the intentional relation to the “world” in the Cartesian way. Moreover, the lived experience pertains to the subject, but it is not “subjective.” Kern provides the following two quotes from Husserl’s The Crisis of the European Sciences as convincing evidence of Husserl’s view: “Psychology, the universal science of the purely psychic in general – therein consists its abstraction” (Husserl, 1978, p. 252) and “in the pure development of the idea of a descriptive psychology, which seeks to bring to expression what is essentially proper to souls, there necessarily occurs a transformation of the phenomenological-psychological epoché and reduction into the transcendental” (Husserl, 1978, p. 257).

Lastly, the “ontological” way may be seen as a direct attack on the psychologist who might mistakenly think phenomenology to refer “simply to the subjective point of view” (compare Kazdin, 2000, p. 162). According to Kern, “Rather, the objective ‘theme’ is implied intentionally in the subjective ‘theme’ (in the intentional life of subjectivity)” (compare Kern, 1977, p. 137). Further, “The change of attitude is to be compared with the transition from the second to the third dimension of space, which contains in itself the second dimension. This subjectivity [emphasis added], in which everything objective is constituted, is the transcendental one” (Kern, 1977, p. 137). Hence, the psychologist who takes phenomenological psychology to be an investigation of “the subjective point of view” understood as a “perspective through which the individual experiences his or her world [emphasis added]” (compare Kazdin, 2000, p. 164) is not actually engaged in phenomenological psychology. Further, the popular tendency to emphasize a subject’s “perspective” as transcending both other subjects and the potential truth value of criticism from other subjects stems from a misunderstanding of phenomenological psychology. As Kern explains, “This subjectivity … is exhibited as an intersubjectivity, made communal through the common objectivity,” and this science is an “exploration of the universal transcendental life, in which worldly objectivity [emphasis added], with its ontological a priori, is constituted” (Kern, 1977, p. 137).

Though an exhaustive list of phenomenologists is outside the scope of this article, what follows is a brief list of major figures in phenomenology. The purpose of this list is to suggest that, despite the heterogeneity of approaches across the figures peopling the list, as far as these individuals were engaged in phenomenology, they participated in a method grounded in the transcendental attitude. These figures include: Edmund Husserl; Martin Heidegger; Jean-Paul Sartre; Maurice Merleau-Ponty; Max Scheler; Edith Stein; Adolf Reinach; Moritz Geiger; Roman Ingarden; Dietrich von Hildebrand; Aron Gurwitsch; and Gabriel Marcel, among many others.

4. Phenomenological Psychology as a Science

a. Phenomenology vs. Phenomenography

As should be clear, phenomenological psychology, as a science, concerns itself with what is necessary and universal in human experience. This is opposed to the approach to human experience that seeks to record subjective experience as subjective. Such an approach, rather than be called “phenomenological,” is better referred to as “phenomenographical” (compare Marton, 1986). Whereas “phenomenology” refers to the study of what is objective in subjective experience, including the structures of subjectivity itself, “phenomenography” refers to the study of what is subjective in subjective experience.

With this distinction in mind, there are a number of research methods classified as within phenomenological psychology to consider. In Phenomenological Psychology: Theory, Research, and Method, Darren Langbridge explains, “when applying phenomenological philosophy to psychology, we aim to focus on people’s perceptions of the world in which they live and what this means to them: a focus on people’s lived experience” (Langbridge, 2007, p. 4). Langbridge links “developments” of phenomenology in philosophy with their corresponding research methods in psychology. For example, he claims “phenomenology” refers to a “descriptive approach,” “existentialism” refers to an “interpretive approach,” and “hermeneutics,” refers to a “narrative approach” (Langbridge, 2007, p. 5). Though not listed by Langbridge, the perhaps most promising of the approaches to phenomenological psychology may be seen in Aron Gurwitsch’s work in the phenomenology of Gestalt psychology (compare Gurwitsch, 1966).

b. Descriptive Phenomenology

Descriptive phenomenology, as seen for example in Amedeo Giorgi’s The Descriptive Phenomenological Method in Psychology, results from not a “transcendental” attitude but one “more appropriate for psychological analyses of human beings since the purpose of psychology as a human science is precisely the clarification of the meanings of phenomena experienced by human persons” (Giorgi, 2009, p. 98). Associating phenomenological psychology with psychology as a human science, Giorgi suggests that in “psychology as a human science … The priority of an already existing methodology is not posited. Rather, what is posited as the privileged position is fidelity to the phenomenon” (Giorgi, 1971, p. 52). Hence, in the “descriptive phenomenological method in psychology” Giorgi explains, “The situations to be described are selected by the participants themselves and what is sought is simply a description that is as faithful as possible” (Giorgi, 2009, p. 96; compare Gilbert and Fisher, 2006; compare MacLeod, 2002; compare Loftus, 1979). Further, Giorgi acknowledges “The fact that the descriptions come from others could be challenged from a phenomenological perspective … but the descriptions provided by the experiencers are an opening into the world of the other [emphasis added] that is shareable” (Giorgi, 2009, p. 96).

c. Interpretive-Hermeneutic Phenomenology

Without discussing the other “developments” of phenomenological psychology here, the following two examples should suffice to contextualize how these developments relate to the descriptive approach. On the one hand, regarding an “Interpretative Phenomenological Analysis,” it is claimed,“One is trying to get close to the participant’s personal world” (Smith and Osborn, 2003, p. 51). On the other hand, it is suggested that the “research results” of such interpretive activities open “upon a limitless field of possible interpretations” (compare Kazdin, 2000, p. 164). Though it is not immediately clear how the results of any research could be subject to “limitless” interpretations, supposing such a characterization were true, it is also not clear what the purpose of research in psychology that is open to “limitless” interpretation might be. Hence, the controversy and challenges remain for phenomenological psychology. That is to say, the psychological sciences that self-identify as phenomenological may be interrogated regarding whether they avoid psychologism and whether they might be better classified as phenomenographic.

5. Phenomenological Psychology as the Analytic of Ontic Dasein

a. Heidegger and Science

As exemplified by work found in the Zollikon Seminars, Martin Heidegger has provided a number of valuable insights into how phenomenology may relate to psychology. This is despite the commonly held misconceptions regarding Heidegger’s relation to science. For a clear and concise discussion regarding Heidegger’s relation to science, see Joseph Kockelmans chapter titled “Heidegger on the Essential Difference and Necessary Relationship Between Philosophy and Science” (Kockelmans, 1970, pp. 147-167). According to Kockelmans, Heidegger does indeed see an “unbridgeable gap between philosophy and science.” Yet, “Although scientists generally interpret this view of Heidegger’s as a disparaging one, this is in no way his intention” (Kockelmans, 1970, p. 148).

In the November 23^rd 1965 seminar of the Zollikon Seminars Heidegger explicitly states his position regarding “science.” Heidegger declares, “I have reservations about science – not science as science – but only about the absolute claims of natural science” (Heidegger, 2001, p. 123; compare Heidegger, 1972, p. 77; compare Caputo, 1973; compare Krell, 2008, p. 12). From this discussion, Heidegger provides his understanding of the distinction between psychology and philosophy, and this distinction applies to phenomenology in essentially the same way it was reflected on above in Husserl. That is to say, Heidegger suggests phenomenological psychology is intermediate to phenomenological transcendental philosophy. In Heidegger’s vocabulary, this means that phenomenological psychology is “ontic” and phenomenological transcendental philosophy is “ontological.”

b. Heidegger and Psychology

What this means for Heidegger is that when phenomenology is used as a method to understand being, then phenomenology is used philosophically, and when phenomenology is used as a method to understand being as human being, then it is used psychologically or anthropologically. Put another way, “ontic” refers to the facts related to human being-in-the-world, and “ontological” refers to the conditions for the possibility of being-in-the-world. Since being is a condition for the possibility of being-in-the-world, an analysis of being will yield ontological insights. Heidegger clarifies, despite the similarity of the language, “Daseinanalysis is ontic. The analytic of Dasein is ontological” (Heidegger, 2001, p. 124). Further, “in Being and Time there was often talk about ‘Daseinanalysis.’ In this context, Daseinanalysis does not mean anything more than the actual exhibition of the determination of Da-sein as thematized in the analytic of Da-sein” (Heidegger, 2001, p. 125). Similar to the discussion of the possibility of phenomenological psychology regarding Husserl above, this is an important distinction for phenomenological psychology in Heidegger, since “Insofar as the latter is defined as existence, these determinations of Da-sein are called existentialia (compare Keen, 1975). Therefore, the concept of ‘Daseinanalysis’ [in contrast to psychological ‘Dasein-analysis’] still belongs to the analytic of Dasein and, therefore, to ontology” (Heidegger, 2001, p. 125).

To be clear, beings may be described in terms of cultural and historical facts. However, such descriptions fall short of understanding being as the condition for the possibility of beings. Frederick Wilhelmsen (1923-1996) famously described this difference in terms of beings as nouns and be-ing as a participle. Heidegger’s point here, then: it is not so much the case that ontic concerns are psychologistic (though they may be) as it is the case that they fall short of authentic ontological insights. What this means for phenomenological psychology is that insofar as it merely views the ontic fact domain of (human) being, then, according to Heidegger (like Kant and Husserl before him), it falls short of the transcendental attitude. However, just as descriptive psychology was seen above as intermediate on the way to the transcendental attitude, it is possible to interrogate the facts of human being through transcendental analysis, and such an interrogation leads to the “conditions for the possibility” of such facts. The analysis of these conditions, then, is the “analytic of Da-sein.” Hence, phenomenological psychology is not an exclusive enterprise insofar as the phenomenologically trained psychologist can, through such an analytic, rise to transcendental phenomenology and study ontology; though in doing so, they are no longer studying psychology. That is to say, on the one hand, psychology is clearly delimited from ontology. On the other hand, psychology is grounded in ontology. There can be no human being, if there is no be-ing. So, what is the value of phenomenology for psychology?

c. The Therapeutic Value of Minding the Clearing

The term “existential” should invoke the notion of freedom. As disclosing the existentials (existentialia), then, phenomenology may be used as a method toward an awareness, which is psychologically therapeutic, in its affirmation of human freedom. Just as existentialism and freedom belong together, so too awareness of the conditions making human experiences possible, when considered from the first-person perspective regarding lived experience, may be therapeutic. In essence this is the training of a client seeking psychotherapy to perform a phenomenological reduction to accomplish a transcendental attitude to their own lived experience. This is Da-sein analysis. This may be accomplished through analysis of the existentials conditioning the person-seeking-therapy’s being. Ultimately this is ontology, through psychology, not psychology; however, it is still related to psychology as being psychotherapeutic. By bringing each (human) being to an awareness of the clearing of being in which their being human in accomplished, they may “take hold of” their being differently (compare Heidegger, 1962), and this is an affirmation of the person’s freedom, which may be therapeutic given the everyday possibilities through which humans may forget the be-ing which allows beings to be.

6. Conclusion

The above discussion of phenomenology from the perspectives of a movement, a method and an attitude, clarified by examining shifts found in Husserl’s work, provided support to the value of understanding phenomenology as related to transcendental philosophy. Further, such an understanding of phenomenology elucidates the consistent thread running through the heterogeneous styles of the major figures standardly considered phenomenologists. In order to clarify further the meaning of phenomenological psychology as a science, phenomenology was contrasted with phenomenography. Phenomenography refers to the study of the merely subjective aspects of experience. Toward clarifying possible confusion regarding the potential use of phenomenology for psychology, the claim was made that much of was is called “phenomenology” today is actually phenomenography. This is an important insight involving an important distinction, and perhaps with further dissemination the controversy surrounding phenomenology will be resolved.

Lastly, Heidegger’s style of phenomenology and its relation to psychology was discussed. This included clarification, through Heidegger’s own words, of his position regarding science. Heidegger’s Da-sein analysis continues to have influence around the globe as a viable psychotherapeutic method. Interestingly, Heidegger’s Da-sein analysis, though expressed near the end of his career, has deep ties with and resonates with his Being and Time. Yet, this also extends Heidegger’s value and influence beyond even academic philosophy and psychology, since Heidegger’s philosophy, as a kind of therapy does not, necessarily, require a therapist. That is to say, Heidegger’s teaching regard the first-person perspective in such a way that it becomes possible for readers in understanding his vocabulary to begin to “see” being as he described it. The therapeutic value involved then, points further to the efficacious presence of philosophy in psychology and phenomenological psychology.

7. References and Further Reading

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Allison, Henry. (1975). The Critique of Pure Reason as Transcendental Phenomenology. In D. Ihde ad R.M. Zaner, (Eds.) Dialogues in Phenomenology. (pp. 137-155). The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
Brennan, James F. (2002). History and Systems of Psychology. New York: Pearson Prentice Hall.
Cairns, Dorion. (2010). “Nine Fragments on Psychological Phenomenology,” Journal of Phenomenological Psychology 41: 1-27.
Caputo, John D. (1973). “Language, Logic, and Time.” Research in Phenomenology 3: 174-155.
Carpenter, Andrew. (2003). Davidson’s Transcendental Argumentation. In J. Malpas, (Ed.). From Kant to Davidson: Philosophy and the Idea of the Transcendental. (pp. 219-237). London: Routledge.
Churchland, Paul. (1981). Eliminative Materialism and the Propositional Attitudes. The Journal of Philosophy, 78.2: 67-90.
Deleuze, Gilles. (1984). Kant’s Critical Philosophy, translated by H. Tomlinson and B. Habberjam. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
Dufrenne, Mikel. (1966). The Notion of the A Priori. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
Dreyfus, Hubert. (2000). Responses. In M. Wrathall and J. Malpas, Ed. Heidegger, Coping, and Cognitive Science. (pp. 313-351). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Ensign, Grayson H. and Howe, Edward. (1989). Counseling and Demonization: The Missing Link. Amarillo, Tx: Recovery Publications.
Farber, Marvin. (1968). The Foundation of Phenomenology. Albany: SUNY Press.
Feigl, Herbert. (1959). “Philosophical Embarrassments of Psychology,” American Psychologist, 14: 115-128.
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Gilbert, Julian A. E. and Fisher, Ronald P. (2006). “The effects of varied retrieval cues on reminiscence in eyewitness memory,” Applied Cognitive Psychology 20.6: 723-729.
Giorgi, Amedeo. (2009). The Descriptive Phenomenological Method in Psychology: A Modified Husserlian Approach. Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press.
Giorgi, Amedeo. (1971). “The Experience of the Subject as a Source of Data in Psychological Experiment,” in Phenomenological Psychology, Vol. I. A. Giorgi, W.F. Fischer, R. von Eckartsberg, (Eds). (pp.50-57). Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press.
Gurwitsch, Aron. (1964). The Field of Consciousness. Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press.
Gurwitsch, Aron. (1974). Phenomenology and the Theory of Science. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
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Hegel, G.W.F. Phenomenology of Spirit, translated by A.V. Miller. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1977.
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Heidegger, Martin. Being and Time, translated by J. Macquarrie and E. Robinson. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1962.
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Heidegger, Martin. Mindfulness, translated by P. Emad and T. Kalary. New York: Bloomsbury Academic, 2006.
Heidegger, Martin. On Time and Being, translated by J. Stambaugh. New York: Harper & Row, 1972.
Heidegger, Martin. What is a Thing? translated by W.B. Barton and V. Deutsch. Chicago: Henry Regnery, 1967.
Heidegger, Martin. Zollikon Seminars, translated by F. Mayr and R. Askay, Evanston, IL: Northwestern University, 2001.
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Husserl, Edmund. (1999). Cartesian Meditations, translated by D. Cairns. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
Husserl, Edmund. (1970). The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology: An Introduction to Phenomenological Philosophy, translated by D. Carr. Evanston: Northwestern University.
Husserl, Edmund. (1983). Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy, Book I, T.E. Klein and W.E. Pohl, (Trans.). The Hague: Matinus Nijhoff.
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Husserl, Edmund. (1980). Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy, Book III, T.E. Klein and W.E. Pohl, (Trans.). The Hague: Matinus Nijhoff.
Husserl, Edmund. (1969). Formal and Transcendental Logic, translated by D. Cairns. The Hague: Matinus Nijhoff.
Husserl (2001a). Logical Investigations, Vol. I., translated by D. Moran. New York: Routledge.
Husserl, Edmund. (1977). Phenomenological Psychology: Lectures, Summer Semester, 1925, translated by J. Scanlon. The Hague: Matinus Nijhoff.
Husserl (2001b). Shorter Investigations, translated by Dermot Moran. New York: Routledge.
Kant, Immanuel. (1998). Critique of Pure Reason, translated by P. Guyer and A.W. Wood. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kant, Immanuel. (1900). Dreams of a Spirit-Seer, translated by Emanuel Goerwitz. London: Swan Sonnenschein & Co.
Kant, Immanuel. (2004). Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science, translated by M. Friedman. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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Keen, Ernest. (1975). A Primer in Phenomenological Psychology. Dallas, TX: Holt, Rhinehart and Winston, Inc.
Kern, Iso. (1977). “The Three Ways to the Transcendental Phenomenological Reduction,” in F. Elliston and P. McCormick, (Eds.). Husserl: Expositions and Appraisals. (pp. 126-149). South Bend, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
Kim, Jaegwon. (1984). “Concepts of Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 45: 153-176.
Kim, Jaegwon. (1998). Mind in a Physical World. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kim, Jaegwon. (2005). Physicalism, Or Something Near Enough. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Kim, Jaegwon. (1987). “‘Strong’ and ‘Global’ Supervenience Revisited,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 48: 315-326.
Kitcher, Patricia. (1993). Kant’s Transcendental Psychology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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Author Information

Frank Scalambrino
Email: FrankLScalambrino@gmail.com
Duquesne University
U. S. A.

Compositionality in Language

Compositionality is a concept in the philosophy of language. A symbolic system is compositional if the meaning of every complex expression E in that system depends on, and depends only on, (i) E’s syntactic structure and (ii) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

If a language is compositional, then the meaning of a sentence S in that language cannot depend directly on the context that sentence is used in or the intentions of the speaker who uses it. So, for example, in compositional languages, the meanings of sentences don’t directly depend on

Things said earlier in the conversation
The beliefs or intentions of the person uttering S
Salient objects and events in the environment at the time that S is uttered
The non-semantic character of S’s simple parts, such as their shape or sound

In compositional languages, the meaning of a sentence S directly depends only on the meanings of the words composing S, and the way those words are syntactically related to one another.

Of course, simple expressions in a compositional language might have meanings that depend on the context or on the intentions of their users, as the referent of the English pronoun ‘she’ can depend on who the speaker intends to be referring to. As such, sentences containing expressions such as ‘she’ will indirectly depend on the intentions of their speakers, because the meaning of the sentence depends on the meanings of its simple parts and the meanings of some of those parts depend on the speaker’s intentions.

Several arguments purport to show that not only is natural language compositional, but that it must be, since we could not have the linguistic abilities we in fact do have, unless the languages we speak are compositional. A commitment to compositionality has driven a large amount of research in the philosophy of language and in linguistics, since it appears to be very difficult to provide adequate compositional treatments of commonplace linguistic constructions. On the other hand, some philosophers have argued that natural language is not compositional, or that compositionality induces no substantive restriction on possible theories of meaning.

This article addresses the different ways compositionality has been understood by philosophers and linguists, and surveys the arguments that natural language is, must be, or should be compositional, as well as the arguments that it isn’t or needn’t be.

Interpretations of Compositionality
Arguments for Compositionality
The Dialectical Role of Compositionality in Philosophy
1. Real Meanings
2. Semantic Theories Purportedly at Odds with Compositionality
Challenges to Compositionality
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Interpretations of Compositionality

a. Syntactic Structure

In natural languages (such as English, Cantonese, and Kalaallisut), the smallest meaningful symbols are called “morphemes.” For highly analytic languages such as English, there is a large overlap between morphemes and words: words are largely the smallest meaningful units. English does have a number of morphemes that are not words, however, such as the plural ending –s for nouns, the possessive ending –’s for noun phrases, and the 3^rd person singular ending –s for verbs. These are “bound” morphemes, in that they cannot grammatically occur on their own. In other, more synthetic languages such as Kalaallisut, single words can be made of many meaningful parts. The word atuartariaqalirpuq (“he began to have to study”) contains six morphemes, and can be used by itself as a sentence (example from Bittner 1995).

Morphology is the set of rules governing how morphemes are combined to form words; syntax is the set of rules governing how words are combined to form phrases and, ultimately, sentences. These rules describe (among other things) how smaller parts, the constituents, are put together to form larger units. The syntactic rules that formed an expression can affect its meaning. Consider the expression ‘large horse painting’: it can either mean painting of a large horse or large painting of a horse, depending on whether ‘large’ is modifying ‘horse painting’ or just ‘horse.’

The principal claim regarding compositionality that philosophers have been concerned with is the claim that all actual and possible natural languages are compositional. A natural language is a language that humans learn to speak naturally, as part of their development, as opposed to an artificial language such as computer languages. In this context, the claim that natural languages are compositional amounts to the claim that the meanings of complex (multi-morphemic) expressions are determined by and only by (i) the ways their morphemes are put together by the morphosyntactic rules of the language and (ii) the meanings of those morphemes.

This may seem like a clear statement of a single thesis, but unfortunately there is wide philosophical disagreement concerning (a) what meanings are and (b) how we should understand ‘dependence’ in the statement of compositionality. We turn now to these two issues.

b. Meaning

There are two ways in which there are a wide variety of meanings of ‘meaning.’ First, many different philosophers will use the word ‘meaning’ and understand by it various distinct things. Some will think meanings are conceptual roles; others that they are set-theoretic objects and functions. Second, one and the same philosopher may recognize several types or dimensions of meaning. She may think, for example, that connotations are meanings in one sense, and that denotations are meanings in a different sense. In discussing compositionality, a reasonable stance is to consider all proposed types of meanings as bona fide meanings and therefore understand that there are numerous compositionality theses. For example:

Compositionality of stereotype: the stereotype associated with a complex expression E in a natural language is determined by (and only by) (i) E’s morphosyntactic structure and (ii) the stereotypes associated with E’s morphemes.

Compositionality of semantic features: the semantic features (e.g. [+male] or [+animate], as they attach to ‘he’ and ‘who,’ respectively) of a complex expression E in a natural language is determined by (and only by) (i) E’s morphosyntactic structure and (ii) the semantic features of E’s morphemes.

It goes like this for each possible type or dimension of meaning. The philosophical question is which, if any, of these theses is true. Any argument for or against compositionality should make it clear what conception of meaning it takes to be or not to be compositional. It is quite possible that there are several legitimate conceptions of meaning, each deserving the name ‘meaning,’ where based on some of those conceptions, natural languages are compositional, and based on other of those conceptions, they are not.

The question that has perhaps most concerned philosophers interested in compositionality is whether the truth-conditions of a sentence depend on (and only on) its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts. The truth-conditions of a sentence are simply the conditions under which the sentence is true. The truth-conditions of a sentence do not depend only on its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts if that sentence is true in some conditions and false in others, even though it has the same syntax and the same assignment of meanings to its simple parts. For example, we will later consider sentences such as ‘It is midnight.’ Sometimes this sentence is true, but other times—apparently without a change in the meanings of the words or in the way they are combined—it is false. This is an apparent violation of the compositionality of truth-conditions.

c. Dependence

Dependence and determination are common and vital notions in philosophy, though they are in many ways ambiguous. Sometimes dependence is a functional notion, as in: “the signs of two numbers determine the sign of their product (the sign of their product depends on their signs).” Dependence can also be a causal notion, as in: “the success of our movie depended on our advertising campaign.” It can be a constitutive notion, as in: “whether I win depends on whether I get a card lower than 4.” Regarding the compositionality thesis, there are many ways the notion of dependence has been understood.

i. Functional Dependence

One way of understanding the sense in which the meaning of the whole, according to compositionality, “depends on” the meanings of the parts, and the way those parts are combined, is reading “depends on” as “is a function of.” That is, a symbolic system is compositional if, and only if, the meaning of each complex expression E in that system is a function of (a) E’s syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

A function is a pairing of an input (an element of its domain) with an output (an element of its range). Familiar functions from mathematics are addition, subtraction, and multiplication. For example, the addition function takes two inputs and returns as output their sum: + takes 2 and 3 as inputs and returns 5 as output. The important thing about functions is that for any sequence of inputs there can only be one output. + never takes two numbers and returns both 5 and 7 as outputs. An example of a mathematical operation that is not a function is √x, because, for instance, √4 has two values, +2 and –2.

While we usually talk about functions only in the context of mathematics, common functions are all around us. Consider the function “(biological) mother of”. The inputs to this function are organisms and the outputs are their (biological) mothers. “(Biological) mother of” is a function because it pairs inputs with outputs and it never pairs the same input with distinct outputs (everyone has only one biological mother).

To say that the meaning of an expression E is a function of its syntactic structure and the meanings of its simple parts is to say that there is a function that takes E’s syntactic structure and the meaning of E’s simple parts as input, and returns as output E’s meaning.

ii. The Substitution Principle

If a language L is compositional in the functional sense described in the previous section, then that language satisfies the substitution principle:

SP: If you take any expression E of L, and any morpheme M that occurs in E, and you replace M with a different morpheme M* of L that has the same meaning as M, then the result will have the same meaning as M.

For example, “Sally perspires” is an expression of English. Let’s assume that ‘perspires’ and ‘sweats’ have the same meaning. Then what SP says is that “Sally sweats” has the same meaning as “Sally perspires.” In other words, substituting an expression with one meaning for another expression with the same meaning does not change the meaning of the whole.

If compositionality is true, then SP is true. Remember that a language is compositional when there is a function that, for every expression E in the language, takes E’s syntactic structure and the meaning of E’s simple parts as input, and returns as output E’s meaning. If in expression E, you replace one of E’s morphemes M with another morpheme M* that has the same meaning as M, then you haven’t changed the inputs to the function: the function takes the meanings of the parts as inputs, and though you’ve changed the parts, they still have the same meaning. Since functions always return the same output when given the same input, the meaning of E-with-M*-replacing-M must be the same as the meaning of E-with-M.

It is also true that if a husserlian language satisfies of the substitution principle, then the language is compositional in the functional sense (see [9]). A language is husserlian if one synonym can be substituted for another synonym without changing the grammaticality of the result. For example, no husserlian language can have synonyms ‘likely’ and ‘probable’ where:

‘It is likely that the Spurs will win’ is grammatical.

‘It is probable that the Spurs will win’ is grammatical.

But:

‘The Spurs are likely to win’ is grammatical.

‘The Spurs are probable to win’ is ungrammatical.

So long as all such pairs as ‘likely’ and ‘probable’ here are assigned different meanings, the substitution principle and the functional conception of compositionality are equivalent.

iii. Problems for Functional Dependence

While the functional conception of compositionality is easy to characterize and understand, it fails to capture the full force of the constraint many philosophers have thought compositionality imposes upon semantic theories for natural languages. This is because many semantic theories which are not intuitively compositional are compositional in the functional sense.

One way to see this is by noting that any symbolic system that contains no synonyms and assigns exactly one meaning to each expression is compositional in the functional sense. If a symbolic system contains no synonyms, the meaning function for that language can’t treat two expressions differing only in the substitution of synonyms differently (because there are no such expressions). Thus for any expression E of S, there is a function F that takes E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s parts as inputs and returns the meaning of E as output. This entails that a non-compositional language could be made compositional solely by removing a few redundant expressions (synonyms of other expressions in the language).

Second, the functional conception of compositionality does not demand any particular relatedness among the meanings of related expressions. The functional conception requires only that the meaning function not assign different meanings to expressions that differ only in the substitution of synonyms. It does not require that the meanings it does assign to complex expressions be in any natural way related to the meanings of their parts, or to the meanings of other complex expressions composed of similar parts. For example, consider these meaning assignments:

Le chien aboie. → The dog barks.
Le chat aboie. → The cat dances.
Le chat pue. → The skunk eats.

Sentences (1) and (2) share a verb, but nothing about their assigned meanings are similar; (2) and (3) share a noun phrase, but again nothing about their assigned meanings is similar. Nevertheless, there exists a function that takes the syntax, and the meanings of the morphemes, of each expression on the left, and maps it to the meaning on the right: it’s displayed in (1)-(3). In fact, any random, unsystematic assignment of meanings to sentences is compatible with the functional conception of compositionality, provided that either there are no synonyms or that sentences that differ only in the substitution of synonyms are assigned the same meaning. This is ‘dependence’ only in the weakest sense of that word.

iv. Dependence as Computability

As we shall see, the principal reason for the belief that natural languages are compositional is that only compositionality can explain how we can figure out the meanings of a large range of novel sentences and expressions, whose meanings we have not specifically learned at any point. Compositionality, construed as computability, says that if you know the syntactic structure of an expression E, and you know the meanings of E’s simple parts, this suffices for you to “work out” the meaning of E: there exists a procedure that you can use, which after a finite number of steps, tells you the meaning of E itself. In other words, the meaning of any expression E is computable from (a) E’s syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

If the meaning of any expression E is computable from E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s simple parts, then it is a function of E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s simple parts. But the converse is not true, for not every function is computable.

While computability imposes some standard of systematicity in meaning assignments, it nevertheless allows more freedom than we might wish. Consider how different programs running on your computer produce wildly different outputs, even given the same sequence of keystrokes. The outputs of the programs are computed from the keystrokes, but they process that information in radically different ways, and produce outputs of radically different characters. The keys used to type the previous sentence in a word processer might result in a complicated series of moves if typed in a fantasy role-playing game. The computability conception of compositionality says that the transition from the syntax of a complex expression and the meanings of its parts to the meaning of that expression must be a function of the syntax and the meanings of the parts, and that it must be rule-governed; but it doesn’t say anything about what the rules are or can be, except that they can be carried out in a finite number of steps and involve no randomness.

v. Dependence as Mereology

The functional and computational conceptions of dependence, with regard to the thesis that natural languages are compositional, are seemingly weaker than the pre-theoretical conception of dependence that occurs in the thesis itself. There is another conception of dependence in the literature that can reasonably be characterized as too strong (though it is not necessarily false that languages are compositional in this sense).

On this conception, the meanings of the parts of a complex expression are literally part of the meaning of that expression. To see how this could be, consider the view that the meaning of a sentence is a structured proposition. The French sentence [[le chien] aboie]—where bracketing indicates syntactic structure—means a structured proposition such as <<the dog> barks>– where the italicized words stand here for the meanings of ‘le,’ ‘chien,’ and ‘aboie,’ respectively. On this view, the meaning of ‘chien,’ for example, is literally a part of the meaning of ‘le chien aboie.’

This notion of dependence is quite strong: the meaning of a complex expression is made out of its syntactic structure and the meanings of its parts. And while many theories of the meanings of complex expressions, such as the theory of structured propositions, validate the principle of compositionality as interpreted with the mereological conception of dependence, it should be clear that this is more than what philosophers normally mean when they say natural languages are compositional.

vi. The Empirical Conception of Dependence

Finally, it’s possible to define compositionality in terms of the role that it plays in explaining certain of our linguistic abilities. In particular, many philosophers have thought that unless the meanings of complex expressions in natural languages depend on (and only on) (a) the syntax of those expressions and (b) the meanings of those expressions’ parts, we would not be able to learn and understand the languages we in fact learn and understand. Thus we can understand “dependence” here as whatever relation in fact obtains between the meaning of a complex expression and that expression’s syntax and the meanings of its parts that in fact explains our ability to learn and understand new expressions whose meanings we have not learned specifically. We know that language is compositional, but it is an empirical question as to just what compositionality consists in.

The empirical conception of compositionality need not be thought of as a competitor to the other conceptions considered above. Instead, it provides a methodological backdrop against which we can evaluate various proposals regarding the sense of “dependence” at the heart of compositionality. As we saw, the functional conception of dependence is ill-favored precisely because it fails to explain our abilities to learn and understand the natural languages we speak. Any proposed account of compositionality not only has to meet certain internal criteria, such as clarity and consistency, but it also has to (a) actually be true of the languages we speak and (b) actually explain our abilities to learn and understand those languages.

There is of course the possibility that no dependence relation that obtains only between the meanings of complex natural language expressions and their syntax and the meanings of their simple parts plays a discernible role in our linguistic abilities. Perhaps the meanings of complex expressions are partly determined by prior discourse, speaker intentions, salient objects and events in the environment, or the non-semantic character of those expressions’ simple parts, such as their shape or sound. In such an event, it might turn out not just that natural languages are not compositional, but that “compositionality” is without application, its introduction having rested on a false presupposition.

2. Arguments for Compositionality

a. Novelty

We are capable of understanding a very large number—perhaps an infinite number—of sentences that we have never heard before. Consider the sentence frame F:

There is a ______ on television.

Anything describable could be written in the blank: orange-and-green polka-dotted squid, shoe sharpener, cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn…. The first thing to notice is that you would understand each of these sentences, even though presumably you’ve never heard them before and no one has ever taught you the meaning of the specific sentence There is a cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn on television. There are quite a lot of things that are describable in English, and so quite a lot of sentences that fit frame F. Each English speaker has only heard a tiny fraction of these sentences before, but every English speaker understands all of them (or at least those containing the English words that she knows).

If we understand the meaning of a new sentence whose meaning we haven’t been specifically taught before, it must be that we can work out its meaning from information available to us when we hear that sentence and other things that we have already learned.

Suppose for a moment that English is a compositional language, in the sense that the meaning of a sentence of English can be computed (worked out) from its syntactic structure and the meanings of its morphemes. This would explain how one could understand a novel utterance such as There is a cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn on television. English speakers who have never learned the meaning of this sentence specifically have nevertheless learned the meanings of each of the words in it: cauliflower, shape, the past tense morpheme –ed, spacecraft, and so forth. Furthermore, part of mastering a language involves acquiring the ability to parse sentences of that language, that is, to figure out their syntactic structure—for example, figuring out that cauliflower-shaped modifies spacecraft, but on television doesn’t modify Saturn. Thus if English is compositional, English speakers have all they need to understand novel English sentences they have never encountered before—provided those sentences don’t contain unfamiliar words.

We can summarize the argument from novelty as follows:

Premise 1. We are capable of understanding a very large number of English sentences that we have never heard before, whose meanings we have not specifically been taught.

Premise 2. If English is compositional, then English speakers have all the abilities and information they need to understand English sentences they have never encountered before.

Conclusion: The best explanation for the facts described in (1) is that English is in fact compositional.

The premises of the argument from novelty are largely uncontroversial. Since the premises are equally true if ‘English’ is replaced by any other natural language, be it ‘Cantonese’ or ‘Kalaallisut’, the argument suggests that all natural languages are compositional.

As with any inference to the best explanation, however, the argument from novelty is only compelling if there aren’t better or equally good explanations for the target phenomenon—in this case, for English speakers’ ability to understand novel English sentences. It is obvious that if we understand the meaning of a new sentence whose meaning we haven’t been specifically taught before, it must be that we can work out its meaning from information available to us when we hear that sentence and other things that we have already learned. But the information available to us is not limited to (i) the sentence’s syntactic structure and (ii) the meanings of its simple parts. When we hear a novel sentence, we also have information about:

Things said earlier in the conversation
The beliefs or intentions of the person uttering S
Salient objects and events in the environment at the time S is uttered
The non-semantic character of S’s simple parts, such as their shape or sound

If the meaning of a complex expression directly depended on any of these things, we could still explain how English speakers can understand novel utterances, because these are things available to speakers and hearers in a conversation. The argument from novelty can’t by itself establish that all natural languages are compositional, and for that reason it is usually offered with additional arguments for compositionality, to which we now turn.

b. Systematicity

It is commonly argued that the systematicity of natural languages provides good reason to suppose languages are compositional. However, most of the literature fails to provide a clear characterization of systematicity and sometimes very distinct phenomena are all crowded under the one heading.

On the most common way of understanding systematicity, language L is systematic if, and only if, for all expressions E₁, E₂, and E₃ in L, if E₁ can syntactically combine with E₂ to form a grammatical sentence, and E₃ is of the same syntactic category as E₂, then E₁ can combine with E₃ to form a grammatical sentence. For example, the English expression ‘Fred’ can combine with the expression ‘eats bananas’ to form the grammatical sentence ‘Fred eats bananas.’ Since ‘George’ is of the same syntactic category as ‘Fred’ (proper names), if English is systematic then we expect that ‘George eats bananas’ is also a grammatical sentence. Since it is, and since examples such as this are easy to come by, it is often assumed by philosophers that English and other natural languages are systematic, in this sense.

There are reasons to think that English and other natural languages are not systematic in this sense. For example, so-defined, a language is systematic only if its syntactic rules contain no semantic or phonological constraints: it says that any expression can be substituted for any other expression of the same syntactic category, regardless of differences in meaning/ phonology between the two expressions.

Whether a language is systematic, in the sense just discussed, is not obviously relevant to whether it is compositional. After all, systematicity in that sense is only a constraint on which sentences must be grammatical if certain other sentences are grammatical. A language being systematic in that sense is compatible with that language having a non-compositional meaning function.

There is, however, another sense of systematicity that is more difficult to precisely characterize, but which is in fact relevant to whether languages are compositional. Consider these two claims about English: For English expressions E₁, E₂, E₃, and E₄, when the following conditions are met:

E₁ can combine with E₂ to form a grammatical sentence [E₁ E₂].

Example: ‘Dogs’ can combine with ‘chase cars’ to form the sentence ‘Dogs chase cars.’

E₃ can combine with E4 to form a grammatical sentence [E₃ E₄].

Example ‘Cats’ can combine with ‘eat mice’ to form the sentence ‘Cats eat mice.’

E₁ is of the same grammatical category as E₃.
E₂ is of the same grammatical category as E₄.

Then the following two claims hold:

Claim 1: Anyone who can understand [E₁ E₂] and [E₃ E₄] can also understand [E₁ E₄] and [E₃ E₂], when the latter are well-formed.

Example: Anyone who can understand ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘cats eat mice’ can also understand ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’

Claim 2: The meanings of [E₁ E₂] and [E₃ E₄] are predictably related to the meanings of [E₁ E₄] and [E₃ E₂], when the latter are well-formed.

Example: ‘dogs chase cars’ has a meaning that is predictably related to both ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’

It can be argued that any language that is like English in this way is most likely a compositional language. The argument runs as follows. If English is compositional, then understanding ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘cats eat mice’ involves (a) knowing the meanings of all the morphemes in the two sentences and (b) being able to recognize the syntactic structure of both sentences. Furthermore, if English is compositional, such knowledge and abilities suffice to understand ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’ For these sentences are composed of the same morphemes, put together in the same syntactic structures. Thus the best explanation for why Claim 1 is true of English is that English is in fact compositional.

A similar argument can be built around Claim 2. If English is compositional, then the meanings of English expressions are completely determined by (a) their syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of their morphemes. Since the expressions ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘dogs eat mice’ partially overlap in their morphemes, they partially overlap in what determines their meanings, if compositionality is true. Thus the fact that they have related meanings is some evidence that English is in fact compositional.

Neither of these arguments is very strong on its own, though each may be combined with other arguments or evidence for compositionality to marshal a stronger case. First, it can be argued that Claim 1 and Claim 2 are not true of all English expressions E₁, E₂, E₃, and E₄. With regard to Claim 1, someone might, for instance, know what ‘natural disaster’ and ‘wine selection’ mean without knowing what ‘natural selection’ means. This is because, in particular, the meaning of ‘natural selection’ is not wholly predictable from the meanings of ‘natural’ and ‘selection.’ Finally, both arguments are inferences to the best explanation: they claim, respectively, that the compositionality of English best explains Claim 1, and that it best explains Claim 2. However, there are non-compositional meaning functions that also predict Claims 1 and 2. For example, if the meaning of a complex expression is a function of the meanings of its parts and the phonetic properties of its parts, then it would be no surprise, for instance, that sentences with overlapping morphemes had overlapping meanings. Thus whether compositionality is the best explanation for these claims may depend on what other independent reasons we have for accepting that English is compositional.

c. The Inductive Argument

A third argument for compositionality is predicated on (a) the apparent compositionality of a wide variety of linguistic phenomena and (b) the success of compositional semantics in compositionally analyzing apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena.

Consider a simple English sentence: ‘Jenny loves baseball.’ Even without a well-defined notion of dependence, it is difficult to see how the meaning of this sentence depends on anything other than the meanings of ‘Jenny,’ ‘loves,’ and ‘baseball,’ and the way those words are syntactically combined. External features such as the intentions of a speaker using the sentence on a particular occasion, and the context in which the sentence is used, may well affect what gets implicated by the sentence, but don’t apparently affect its literal meaning. Furthermore, formal features of the sentence, such as the fact that each of the words it contains has two syllables, are also apparently irrelevant to its literal meaning. The meaning of ‘Jenny loves baseball’ apparently depends on, and only on, (a) its syntax and (b) the meanings of its simple parts. This sentence, and a large portion of the language we speak, is apparently compositional.

Now consider a different example: ‘Every girl loves some sport.’ This sentence has two meanings. First, it can mean that for each girl, there is some sport she loves—even if for different girls it’s different sports. For example, if Jenny and Liz are the only girls, the sentence will be true if Jenny loves baseball and no other sport and Liz loves hockey and no other sport. Second, it can mean that there is one particular sport that every girl loves. If Jenny loves only baseball and Liz only hockey, then the sentence is false, because there is no sport loved by all girls. This sentence is therefore apparently non-compositional. On every occasion of use, the sentence appears to have one and the same syntactic structure, and its parts all appear to have the same meanings. If compositionality were true, then, the sentence couldn’t have different meanings on different occasions, because what determines its meaning is the same on all occasions. And yet, it apparently does have different meanings on different occasions.

This is not an argument against the compositionality of English, but rather one for it. The second half of the inductive argument for compositionality concedes that there are indeed a great many apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena in English—this quantifier scope case being just one among them. However, the argument continues, a rather large subset of the great many apparently non-compositional phenomena have been considered by linguists in the past several decades and been given satisfactory compositional analyses. (With regard to our example, the most common solution has been to regard it as really having two syntactic structures, corresponding to its two meanings. See the References and Further Reading.) Since compositional semantics has been such a fruitful and successful research program in the past and there’s no reason to think it will cease to be in the future, we have strong reason to suppose that English is in fact compositional, even if some of it appears not to be.

The inductive argument holds up the past successes of compositional semantics as a good reason to believe that English (and any other language we’ve seriously and successfully investigated) is compositional. However, there remain apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena that have not been given universally agreed upon—or even widely endorsed—compositional analyses (see section 4, Challenges to Compositionality). Some of these cases, such as generic statements, may well have particular features that justify us in thinking that they cannot be given compositional analyses.

One additional point is worth making. A common construal of compositional semantics in linguistics is that the goal is to assign logical forms (LFs) to sentences of natural language in a compositional way. LFs are themselves representations and are not (standardly considered) the same things as meanings. LFs are “in the head,” unlike propositions, states of affairs, situations, truth-conditions, and so forth. Thus, the fact that an LF can be compositionally determined from the (a) syntactic structure of a sentence and (b) the lexical entries for that sentence’s morphemes does not entail that the meaning of the sentence is determined by those things—at least not without further argumentation. Thus the past success of semantic theory could be irrelevant to the question whether natural languages are compositional.

3. The Dialectical Role of Compositionality in Philosophy

a. Real Meanings

Section 1.b endorsed a sort of meaning pluralism, that all proposed meanings (stereotypes, features, referents, senses…) were bona fide meanings and that it made sense to ask whether meaning was compositional, in any of the bona fide senses. But compositionality can also be used as a litmus test for determining which of these meanings is important or relevant to philosophical theorizing, as follows:

X is the Real Meaning of expression E =_df. Understanding E requires pairing it with X.

The Real Meaning of an expression is the meaning whose grasp is both necessary and sufficient for understanding that expression. This notion of Real Meaning can then be used to discredit various meanings that are not compositional, as follows. As the argument from novelty suggests, our ability to understand new sentences whose meanings we have not specifically learned, requires that we compute those meanings from the sentences’ syntactic structures and the meanings of their parts. Thus, the Real Meaning of complex expressions in English must be compositionally determined. Therefore, if Y-meanings are not compositionally determined, then Y-meanings aren’t Real Meanings.

b. Semantic Theories Purportedly at Odds with Compositionality

The principle of compositionality has been employed in arguments against almost every semantic theory, including theories in metaethics of the meaning of normative terms. Presented here are four illustrative examples: first, Frege’s puzzle for the “naïve theory” of meaning of names, that names mean what they name; second, two very standard cases of discrediting theories (in this case, conceptual role semantics and verificationism) with the principle of compositionality; finally, the Frege-Geach problem for non-cognitivist theories in metaethics. Other examples can be found in References and Further Reading.

i. Direct Reference Theory

According to the “naïve theory” of the meaning of proper names (often also called the direct reference theory) the meaning of a name is its referent, the thing it names. If the direct reference theory is true and compositionality is true, it follows that two sentences that differ only in the substitution of one co-referring name for another will mean the same thing. For example, sentences (a) and (b) will mean the same thing, because “Lady Gaga” and “Stefani Germanotta” both refer to the same person:

(a) Lady Gaga is a professional singer.

(b) Stefani Germanotta is a professional singer.

This seems like a reasonable position. Whenever (a) is true, (b) is also true, and vice versa. So (a) and (b) have the same truth-conditions, and it’s reasonable to then think they have the same meaning. But now consider two other sentences that are like (a) and (b) in that they differ only in the substitution of one co-referring name for another:

(d) Elaine expects to see Stefani Germanotta.

Since Lady Gaga is Stefani Germanotta, the direct reference theory (plus compositionality) predicts that (c) and (d) have the same meaning. But prima facie, it seems that (c) could be true and (d) false, or (d) true and (c) false. Elaine may have heard Lady Gaga on the radio, and purchased a ticket to her concert, completely oblivious to the fact that Lady Gaga is Stefani Germanotta. She expects to see Gaga, but would be very surprised to learn she was to see Germanotta. She might even become angry at learning that Germanotta will be performing all night, because she prefers to see Gaga.

It follows that three things are inconsistent: (i) our naïve judgments regarding the truth-conditions of (c) and (d); (ii) the direct reference theory; and (iii) the thesis that English is compositional. This is called “Frege’s Puzzle” after Gottlob Frege, who first posed it. Some philosophers have taken it as a reason to reject the direct reference theory.

ii. Conceptual Role Semantics

According to the inferentialist, the meaning of a simple sentence of the form x is an F is the set of sentences we can infer are (probably) true, assuming x is an F. For example, the meaning of “This is a tree” would be a set of sentences containing things such as “This has leaves,” “This is a plant,” “This has branches,” “This grows,” “This is relatively stationary,” and so forth. The inferentialist further holds that the meaning of a complex sentence is also the set of sentences we can infer are (probably) true from it. This is a variety of conceptual role semantics.

Now consider the sentence “This is a green fish.” Green fish are relatively uncommon, so plausibly you can infer “This is rare” from “This is a green fish,” and thus according to conceptual role semantics “This is rare” is an element of the meaning of “This is a green fish.” However, neither green things nor fish are uncommon in nature. So “This is rare” is not an element of the meaning of either “This is green” or “This is a fish.”

This is just one example of the broader principle that the normal features of things that are F and G are not a function of the normal features of things that are F and the normal features of things that are G. Thus, the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are F and G will not be a function of the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are F and the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are G. That is, this version of conceptual role semantics is incompatible with compositionality.

iii. Verificationism

Compositionality presents analogous troubles for theories that are similar to conceptual role semantics, such as the theory that the meaning of a sentence is the set of experiences that confirm it or the theory that the meaning of an expression is a stereotype. Suppose that the meaning of a sentence S is the set of experiences E such that E raises the probability that S is true.

For the sake of the example, suppose that cows comprise a tiny proportion of the dangerous animals, and that brown animals also comprise a tiny proportion of the dangerous animals. Further, all dangerous cows are brown and all dangerous brown animals are cows. Now suppose you encounter one and only one animal and experience E an animal-mauling. E lowers the probability that the animal was brown, because most dangerous animals are not-brown. E lowers the probability that the animal was a cow, because most dangerous animals are non-cows. But E raises the probability that the animal was a brown cow.

The set of experiences that confirms this is a brown cow is not a function of the set of experiences that confirms this is a brown thing and the set of experiences that confirms this is a cow. Thus verificationism is incompatible with compositionality.

iv. Moral Non-Cognitivism

According to the expressivist, sentences involving normative terminology such as ‘good’ and ‘bad’ and ‘right’ and ‘wrong’ play a different role in communication than ordinary descriptive sentences, containing no such terminology. For example, when George says something descriptive, such as “figure-skating is difficult,” he is expressing his belief that figure-skating is difficult. The role of descriptive statements is to express one’s beliefs. But, according to the expressivist, the role of normative terminology is to express one’s approval or disapproval. When George says something normative, such as “figure-skating is right” or “figure skating is wrong,” he is expressing his approval or disapproval of figure-skating.

Consider the sentence, “figure-skating is not wrong.” What does this sentence express? It’s not disapproval of figure-skating, obviously, because that’s what the expressivist thinks “figure-skating is wrong” means. But neither is it approval of figure-skating. You can think something is not wrong without thinking that it is right—figure-skating, for instance, is neither right nor wrong. It is morally neutral; it is morally permissible. Expressivist accounts then say that “figure-skating is not wrong” expresses the speaker’s toleration of figure-skating.

This treatment raises a question: Does the expressivist meaning of “figure-skating is not wrong” depend on and only on the expressivist meaning of “figure-skating is wrong” and the meaning of “not”? At first glance, it would seem that the answer is “no.” According to the expressivist, when George says “figure-skating is wrong” what this expresses is DIS:

DIS. George disapproves of figure skating.

So when George says instead, “figure-skating is not wrong,” this should express something that is a combination of DIS and the meaning of “not.” Two options suggest themselves:

~DIS. George does not disapprove of figure-skating.

DIS~. George disapproves of not figure-skating.

But neither ~DIS nor DIS~ says the same thing as George tolerates figure-skating, which is the meaning of “figure-skating is not wrong,” according to the expressivist. ~DIS is consistent with George having no opinion regarding figure-skating. But tolerating figure-skating—thinking that it is not wrong, that it is an acceptable form of behavior—is having an opinion of figure-skating. It’s having the opposite opinion to one who thinks figure-skating is wrong. DIS~ is also not the meaning the expressivist wants. Tolerating figure-skating is not the same thing as disapproving of those who don’t skate. You can tolerate a behavior without being intolerant of those who don’t engage in it.

This is “the negation problem” for expressivism but it is just part of a broader set of problems for moral non-cognitivist theories in meta-ethics. The broader set of problems—often called the Frege-Geach problem—regards how non-cognitivist theories can deal with logically complex normative sentences (involving words such as “not,” “or,” and “if… then…”) and logical inferences.

4. Challenges to Compositionality

There is no end of linguistic phenomena that have been presented as challenges to the thesis that natural languages are compositional. The examples that follow are therefore intended to illustrate the sorts of problems the compositionality thesis faces, rather than constitute an exhaustive overview.

Section 4a considers an attempt to undermine the dialectical purpose of compositionality by showing that any meaning theory is compatible with the principle of compositionality. Section 4b focuses on context-sensitive expressions. Here Kaplan’s distinction between character and content is introduced as well as the strategy of handling apparently non-compositional phenomena by positing so-called “hidden indexicals.” The key idea introduced in this section is that while compositionality requires that the meanings of complex expressions depend only on their syntactic structure and the meanings of their morphemes, it allows simple expression meanings to depend on anything, including context, speaker intentions, and so on.

Section 4c covers the case of idioms. Although there are plenty of non-compositional idioms, this is not as devastating to the compositionality supporter as one might think. The key idea in 4c is that allowing exceptions to the principle of compositionality in cases where we have specifically learned the meaning of a complex expression doesn’t hurt the dialectical purposes that principle is mainly used for. A real problem for compositionality would be a large number of cases where we are able to understand complex expressions we have never heard before and those expressions are not compositional. Section 4d covers a productive construction in English that seems to suggest just such a problem for compositionality: noun modification.

a. The Triviality Objection

Consider the following argument: the debate over whether natural languages are compositional is pointless. Any language can be given a compositional semantics, for any proposed theory of what meanings are. If meanings are ideas, then we let the meaning of [dogs [chase cats]] be [the idea of dogs [the idea of chasing, the idea of cats]]. If meanings are stereotypes, then we let the meaning of [dogs [chase cats]] be [the stereotype of dogs [the stereotype of chasing, the stereotype of cats]], and so on. In general, the meaning of any complex expression is just that very expression, with the meanings of its simple parts in place of those parts. (This is a type of structured propositions view.)

There are two main reasons the triviality objection fails to convince most philosophers. First, while one can give such meaning theories for complex expressions, these meaning theories conflict with other principles that seem reasonable to hold. For example, we might think that the meaning of ‘cow’ and the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should be the same general type of thing. If the meaning of ‘cow’ is an idea, the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should also be an idea; if the meaning of ‘cow’ is a property—such as the property of being a cow—then the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should also be a property—such as the property of being a brown cow. But according to the triviality objection, we must say instead that while ‘cow’ means the idea of a cow, ‘brown cow’ means a structured complex containing two ideas: the idea of brown and the idea of a cow.

Second, even if structured propositions don’t violate any of our other commitments, most structured propositionalists believe that the structured proposition that is the meaning of a sentence determines the truth-conditions of that sentence. And it is far from obvious that one can work out the truth-conditions of ‘this is my pet fish’ from a structured proposition containing the stereotype of a pet and the stereotype of a fish. It is not a trivial question to ask whether the truth-conditions of a sentence depend on (and only on) that sentence’s syntax and the meanings of its simple parts.

b. Context-Sensitive Expressions

Consider the sentence ‘I am Socrates.’ Sometimes when the sentence is uttered, it is true; at other times it is false. Although we might try to defend the claim that true utterances of ‘I am Socrates’ have a different syntactic structure from false utterances of ‘I am Socrates,’ this seems wholly implausible. Clearly the truth or falsity of the sentence depends on who is saying the sentence.

At first, this might seem like proof that the truth-conditions of English sentences are not determined compositionally. Here is the argument: suppose that Aristotle says, ‘I am Socrates.’ This sentence is false because its truth-value depends on who says it: it is true only if the person who says it is Socrates. However, Aristotle is not the meaning of ‘am’ or ‘Socrates,’ as anyone can tell. Aristotle is also not the meaning of ‘I,’ otherwise when Socrates says ‘I am Socrates’ he would mean ‘Aristotle is Socrates.’ So the truth-value of ‘I am Socrates’ depends on something that is not its syntactic structure and is not the meanings of any of the words comprising it. And it doesn’t help to say that ‘I’ means ‘the person saying this sentence,’ because now we are faced with the exact same problem: sometimes ‘The person saying this sentence is Socrates’ is true and sometimes it is false. But it has the same syntactic structure and its morphemes mean the same thing on both the true occasions of utterance and the false ones.

Now we can unravel what’s going on here. There is one sense in which ‘I’ has the same meaning every time it is used. We can call this the character of ‘I.’ There is another sense in which ‘I’ has a different meaning when different people use it. Call this the content of ‘I.’ Character is a rule for determining content. The rule for ‘I’ is: the content of ‘I’ any time it is used is the person who is using it. So when Aristotle and Socrates both use the word ‘I’ it has different contents for each use—Aristotle and Socrates, respectively—but those contents are determined by one and the same character (rule). The truth of ‘I am Socrates,’ when used by any particular person, is completely determined by (and only by) the syntax of the sentence and the contents of its morphemes.

English has a variety of expressions that differ in content from context to context. We call these context-sensitive expressions:

Now, today, yesterday, tomorrow
Here, there, local, nearby
I, you, he, she, it, they, we
Come, go, left, right
This, that, these, those
Thus, so, yea

Some of these have characters that determine their contents with no interpretation necessary. ‘Today’ always names the day on which it is used. The rule for ‘that,’ however, is roughly that its content is whatever the speaker intends.

The general point here is that compositionality requires that the meaning of a complex expression not be determined ‘directly’ by context or by speaker intentions. However, a language can still be compositional if its simple expressions have their meanings (contents) determined by context or by speaker intentions.

Some philosophers have proposed compositional analyses of various apparently non-compositional phenomena that appeal to unwritten, unspoken context-sensitive expressions (“hidden indexicals”). For example, consider the sentence, ‘There is no beer.’ It might mean on different occasions: there is no beer on this menu; there is no beer at this party; there is no beer in this bottle, and so on. This could be because the sentence ‘There is no beer’ has its meaning determined by factors other than the meanings of its parts and the way they are combined. Alternatively, it could be because there is a hidden indexical ‘there’ that is really part of the sentence. The indexical, though present, is not written or spoken. Nevertheless, it contributes its context-sensitive content to the meaning of the sentence, thus accounting for the variability in the sentence’s truth-value from context to context. There is nothing theoretically problematic about such a hidden indexical account, but it should be emphasized that whether hidden indexicals exist in these cases is an empirical question that might turn out to be false.

c. Idioms

The term ‘idiom’ covers a wide range of expressions, including stale metaphors (she’s on the fence, he ran out of steam), common hyperboles (he drinks like a fish, there was no room to swing a cat), and even common phrases (she’s last but not least, there’s method to his madness). To the extent that we don’t think metaphor or hyperbole pose any trouble for the thesis that natural languages are compositional these types of idioms appear equally benign.

However, there are some idioms whose meanings cannot be worked out by someone familiar only with their syntax and the meanings of their parts and whose meanings can’t be understood as implicatures. Consider idioms such as she let the cat out of the bag, or I think he’s pulling your leg. Understanding these complex expressions requires learning their meanings in advance, separate from the meanings of their parts. In fact, many idioms contain ‘words’ that do not otherwise occur in the language, or only occur with different meanings (that’s beyond the pale, this is an old wives’ tale).

It is not uncommon for philosophers to assert that compositionality admits of finitely many exceptions, and as there are only finitely many idioms in any language, compositionality is not violated. This is not strictly speaking true. The most general formulation of compositionality—the meaning of any complex expression depends on and only on its syntax and the meanings of its parts—admits of no exceptions, nor do many of its various precisifications—for example, reading ‘depends on’ as ‘is a function of,’ or ‘can be computed from.’

On the assumption that ‘kick the bucket’ has the same syntax, and simple parts with the same meanings, in both its idiomatic and its non-idiomatic meaning, its meaning is not a function of its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts, for functions have unique outputs. The substitution test fails: ‘kicked the pail’ does not have the same meaning as the idiomatic ‘kicked the bucket,’ despite having the same syntax and parts with the same meanings. In a more intuitive sense, the meaning of ‘kicked the bucket’ doesn’t depend on the meanings of ‘kick’ and ‘bucket’—those meanings, the act of kicking and bucket are neither here nor there with respect to the idiomatic meaning of ‘kick the bucket.’

Here is what motivates the common refrain that “compositionality admits of finitely many exceptions.” Recall that the argument from novelty says that the best explanation for our ability to understand complex expressions whose meanings we have not been specifically taught is that those expressions have their meanings determined compositionally. The argument from novelty is irrelevant to complex expressions whose meanings we have been specifically taught. This includes the problematic idioms. No one understands “she let the cat out of the bag” or “he’s just pulling your leg” before they have been taught the specific meaning of those idioms. What the argument from novelty suggests is that new complex expressions must be composed only of expressions whose meanings we have learned specifically before—but these latter expressions can be simple like “dog” or complex like “let the cat out of the bag.”

While idioms may demonstrate that not all complex expressions have their meanings determined compositionally, it is important to note that compositionality may still serve its dialectical role. The argument from novelty shows that sentences we can understand without having learned their meaning specifically must have meanings that depend on parts whose meanings we have learned specifically. Thus we still have reason to doubt that the Real Meaning of “this is a green fish” is its inferential role, because (i) “this is a green fish” is the sort of sentence English speakers can understand without having learned its meaning specifically (unlike, for instance, “she let the cat out of the bag”) and (ii) as we’ve seen, the inferential role of “this is a green fish” does not depend on the inferential roles of “this is green” and “this is a fish.”

Nevertheless, idioms could still pose a threat to the claim that novel expressions are compositional, if it turns out there are non-compositional idioms we can understand, even though we have not been specifically taught their meanings. For example, consider the class of expressions that involve a VERB + the removal of relatively irremovable things to mean something like VERB-ed excessively: she cried her eyes out/ laughed her head off/ worked her butt off/ danced the night away… It might be that we can recognize novel instances of patterns like this, in ways that don’t involve calculating their meanings from the meanings of their parts. How exactly we process the meanings of sentences containing idioms is as of now an open question, and it might turn out that we speak a language that violates the principle of compositionality even for novel expressions.

d. Noun Modification

English nouns can be combined with other English nouns to form compound nouns—for example, ‘truck driver,’ ‘panda trainer,’ ‘demolition derby,’ and so forth. This process is productive: ‘You are reading the compositionality philosophy encyclopedia entry compounds section’ (the section on compounds from the entry in the encyclopedia of philosophy about compositionality).

One interesting aspect of noun compounds in English is that they do not specify the relation between the two nouns, and this relation differs from occasion to occasion. A house boat, for example, is a boat used as a house; but a boat house is not a house used as a boat, it’s a house for your boat to live in. A dog house is a house for a dog to live in, but a house dog is not a dog for a house to live in, nor is it a dog used as a house, it’s a dog that lives exclusively in the house. (Still more relations abound: brick house, house appraisal, house party…)

While we might treat many compounds simply as idioms there are two general additional problems they pose: their productivity, as stated, and also the fact that nonce or novel compounds are regularly understood. Consider these examples:

Example 1: We are at a child’s birthday party, about to eat ice cream. There are several spoons, each of which has a different animal depicted on it. I tell you, “You can have the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon with a dog depiction on it.

Example 2: Similar birthday party scenario. This time there are only normal spoons. Unfortunately, there are only as many spoons as guests, and the dogs at the party have gotten ahold of one of them and slobbered all over it. I tell you, “Sorry, there’s no ice cream for you, unless you want the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon that the dogs have been playing with.

Example 3: You and I are shopping for a friend who likes to collect spoons. We find some very nice Chinese commemorative spoons from different years. With the background knowledge that our friend was born in the year of the dog, and that only one spoon is from the year of the dog, I say “Let’s get the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon that commemorates a year that is also a year of the dog in the Chinese zodiac.

In each of the examples, ‘dog’ means the same thing it always does, because ‘dog’ is not an indexical such as ‘I’ or ‘today’ and does not have different contents on different occasions. Similarly, in each of these examples, ‘spoon’ means the same thing it always does, because ‘spoon’ is not an indexical either. These two words exhaust the morphemes in the expression ‘dog spoon.’ Furthermore, in each of the examples, the syntax of ‘dog spoon’ is the same. And yet, in each of the examples, the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ is different. These facts, if they are facts, are straightforwardly incompatible with the claim that the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ depends on and only on its syntax and the meanings of its morphemes. These examples seem to show that the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ is context-sensitive because it directly depends on context, not because its parts are context-sensitive.

Similar remarks can be made for the English possessive “Heather’s horse”: in separate contexts it can mean: the horse that Heather owns; the horse that Heather has wagered money on; the horse that Heather is currently riding; the horse that shares a name with Heather, and so on. If ‘Heather’, ‘horse,’ and the English possessive morpheme ‘-s’ don’t change their meanings from context to context, then it appears that the meaning of ‘Heather’s horse’ depends directly on context, and is thus not compositional.

Indeed, modification in English generally allows context-specific interpretations: ‘green leaf” in different contexts could mean a leaf that is green on the outside, a leaf that is green on the inside, a leaf that is normally (but not now) green, a leaf depicted in the green volume of a color-coded set of volumes on leaves, and so on. Again, although ‘green leaf’ is context-sensitive, its parts, ‘green’ and ‘leaf’ do not appear to be. This direct dependence of the meaning of a complex expression on context is a violation of compositionality.

There are various attempts at compositional solutions to the problem posed by compound nouns. There are two general strategies: first, one can deny that ‘dog spoon’ or ‘Heather’s horse’ or ‘green leaf’ differ in meaning from one occasion to the next. Second, one can accept that expressions such as these are context-sensitive, but argue that they do contain context-sensitive parts (for example, hidden indexicals) that explain the context-sensitivity.

As an example of the first strategy, some philosophers and linguists have argued that “dog spoon” means only “spoon somehow related to a dog or dogs.” More generally they say that any noun compound N₁ N₂ means “N₂ somehow related to a N₁ or N₁s.” In this way, noun compounds are assigned fixed, non-context-sensitive meanings that only depend on their syntax and the meanings of their parts. Such accounts have unintuitive consequences, to say the least: every time there is a toilet somehow related to paper, there is paper somehow related to a toilet. But it doesn’t obviously follow that whenever there is toilet paper, there are paper toilets. Furthermore, extending the strategy to possessives looks disastrous: If [N₁ [POS N₂]] means “N₂ somehow related to N₁,” then no matter which horse wins the race, Heather’s horse wins the race, because Heather is somehow related to all of them.

An example of the second strategy is to posit a “hidden indexical.” The idea is that ‘dog spoon’ means ‘spoon that bears relation R to dogs,’ where R is a relation-indexical that picks out different relations in different contexts, in the way ‘he’ picks out different males in different contexts. This strategy requires positing a large number of hidden indexicals: whenever nouns are modified by nouns, possessives, or adjectives. As previously discussed, there is nothing theoretically problematic with such solutions, but whether there are such indexicals in these cases is an empirical matter that may well be shown to be false.

5. Conclusion

The principle of compositionality plays a central role in the evaluation of theories of meaning. If the principle is true, or is true with only a constrained class of exceptions, many if not all current theories of meaning may turn out to be inadequate. This includes a number of popular non-cognitivist positions in metaethics. Despite its centrality, it is difficult to say precisely what the principle of compositionality requires, both because philosophers are divided on what exactly meanings are and because of the nebulousness of “dependence.” Furthermore, there are a number of productive, apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena. If the principle of compositionality is untrue, we have to find some other way to explain how humans learn and understand productive languages.

6. References and Further Reading

a. General

There are several overviews of compositionality that have distinct focuses from this article. Readers are warned that much of the secondary literature on compositionality is very technical. Item [2] provides a formal framework for studying variants of compositionality and then surveys many such variants; it requires at least rudimentary knowledge of metalogic. Item [3] is a survey of issues concerning compositionality in Montague semantics; readers should have at least some familiarity with formal semantics in the Montagovian tradition.

[1] Dever, J. 2006. “Compositionality.” In E. Lepore & B. Smith (eds.), The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Language. Oxford University Press: pp. 633-666.
[2] Pagin, P. & Westerståhl, D. 2009. “Compositionality I: Definitions and Variants.” Philosophy Compass 5.3: pp. 250-264.
[3] Partee, B. 2004. “Chapter 7: Compositionality” In her Compositionality in Formal Semantics: Selected Papers by Barbara Partee. John Wiley & Sons.

b. Frege’s Principle

The principle of compositionality is often called “Frege’s Principle,” because Frege is often considered the source or inspiration for the principle. However, it’s a matter of serious scholarly debate whether Frege did, in fact, hold the principle for either of the two kinds of meaning he recognized (Sinn and Bedeutung, or sense and reference). The curious reader is directed to [4] and [5]. Item [5] argues that while Frege held the principle of compositionality of reference (in the form of the substitution principle), there is no good evidence that he thought senses were likewise compositional. (This article also helpfully contains a wide variety of scholarly articulations of what compositionality is.) [4] argues that Frege did not even hold that the referent of a sentence was determined by its syntactic structure and the referents of its parts, because sentences’ referents vary, according to Frege, in ways that directly depend on context.

[4] Janssen, T. 2001. “Frege, Contextuality and Compositionality” Journal of Logic, Language and Information Vol. 10: pp. 115-136.
[5] Pelletier, F. 2001. “Did Frege Believe Frege’s Principle?” Journal of Logic, Language and Information Vol. 10: pp. 87-114.

c. Dependence

Item [9] clarifies the relation between the substitution principle and the functional conception of compositionality. [8] is the locus classicus for the claim that compositionality involves a stronger notion of dependence, computability, than mere functional dependence. [11] is an elaboration and defense of the claim that dependence in the principle of compositionality is supervenience. [7] claims that compositionality is the principle that the meanings of complex expressions are “constructed from” the meanings of its parts and presents the principle of reverse compositionality (in the section “Compositionality and the Lexicon”) and [10] forcefully argues against that principle. [6] defends the empirical conception of dependence.

[6] Dowty, D. 2007. “Compositionality as an Empirical Problem.” In C. Barker & P. Jacobson (eds.), Direct Compositionality, Oxford University Press: pp. 23-101.
[7] Fodor, J. & Lepore, E. 2001. “Why Compositionality Won’t Go Away: Reflections on Horwich’s ‘Deflationary’ Theory.” Ratio 14.4: pp. 350-368.
[8] Grandy, R. 1990. “Understanding and the Principle of Compositionality.” Philosophical Perspectives 4: pp. 557-572.
[9] Hodges, W. 2001. “Formal Features of Compositionality.” Journal of Logic, Language and Information 10 (1): pp. 7-28
[10] Johnson, K. 2006. “On the Nature of Reverse Compositionality.” Erkenntnis 64 (1): pp. 37 – 60.
[11] Szabó, Z. 2000. “Compositionality as Supervenience.” Linguistics and Philosophy, 23: pp. 475-505.

d. Novelty

Most papers on compositionality involve some discussion of the argument from novelty. [12] is the first explicit statement of the argument and the catalyst for contemporary discussions of it.

[12] Davidson, D. 2001. “Theories of meaning and learnable languages.” In his Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation. Clarendon Press: pp. 3-16.

e. Systematicity

There are two separate bodies of literature on systematicity. First, there are arguments for and against certain views of cognitive architecture involving a syntactic notion of systematicity. The opening volley is [15]. Item [13] contains a thorough discussion of how to understand this notion of systematicity, and [16] and [17] carefully consider whether natural language is systematic in this sense. The other semantic sense of systematicity and the argument for compositionality based on it can be found in a number of Fodor’s works, including [14] pp. 106-107.

[13] Cummins, R. 1996. “Systematicity.” Journal of Philosophy 93: pp. 591-614.
[14] Fodor, J. 1994. “Concepts: A Potboiler.” Cognition 50: pp. 95-113.
[15] Fodor, J. & Pylyshyn, Z. 1988. “Connectionism and Cognitive Architecture.” Cognition 28: pp. 3-71.
[16] Johnson, K. 2004. “On the Systematicity of Language and Thought.” Journal of Philosophy 101: pp. 111-139.
[17] Pullum, G. & Scholz, B. 2007. “Systematicity and Natural Language Syntax.” Croatian Journal of Philosophy 21: pp. 375-402.

f. Compositionality vs. Theories of Meaning

Frege’s Puzzle originally occurs in [18]. There is a large literature on the puzzle; [23] is one detailed defense of the naïve theory. [19] is one of many examples of arguments against conceptual-role semantics using the principle of compositionality. Michael Dummett developed a sophisticated conceptual-role semantics; [22] is an excellent overview, as well as an argument that Dummett’s semantics too is non-compositional. The Frege-Geach problem appears in [20] and [25]. Hare casts the problem in terms of compositionality in [21]. [24] provides an accessible overview.

[18] Frege, G. 1997. “On Sinn and Bedeutung (1892).” In M. Beaney (ed.), The Frege Reader: pp. 151-171.
[19] Fodor, J. & Lepore E. 1993. “Why Compositionality (Probably) Isn’t Conceptual Role.” Philosophical Issues 3, Science and Knowledge: pp. 15-35.
[20] Geach, P. 1965. “Assertion.” Philosophical Review 74: pp. 449-465.
[21] Hare, R. 1970. “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 79: pp. 3-24.
[22] Pagin, P. 2009. “Compositionality, Understanding, and Proofs.” Mind 118 (471): pp. 713-737.
[23] Salmon, N. 1986. Frege’s Puzzle. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
[24] Schroeder, M. 2008. “What Is the Frege-Geach Problem?” Philosophy Compass 3/4: pp. 703-720.
[25] Searle, J. 1962. “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 71: pp. 423-432.

g. Triviality

Item [28] presents the triviality argument considered in this article. Items [7] and [27] are two different attempts at undermining Horwich’s conclusions. A distinct triviality argument is presented in [29]; [26] provides a response. Familiarity with formal logic is required for [29] and [26].

[26] Dever, J. 1999. “Compositionality as Methodology.” Linguistics and Philosophy 22: pp. 311-326.
[27] Heck, R. 2013. “Is Compositionality a Trivial Principle?” Frontiers of Philosophy in China 8 (1): pp. 140-55
[28] Horwich, P. 1997. “The Composition of Meanings.” Philosophical Review 106: pp. 503-532.
[29] Zadrozny, W. 1994. “From Compositional to Systematic Semantics.” Linguistics and Philosophy 17.4: pp. 329-342.

h. Context-Sensitive Expressions

Item [31] is a classic and informs most contemporary work on context-sensitive expressions. [32] is an admirably clear treatment of what the principle of compositionality does and does not say about context-sensitivity. [33] began a debate about “unarticulated constituents”: aspects of meaning that are contextually supplied, but not compositionally derived. [30], [34], and [35] are three different contemporary perspectives in the debate.

[30] Carston, R. 2000. Explicature and Semantics. UCL Working Papers in Linguistics 12.1.
[31] Kaplan, D. 1989. “Demonstratives.” In J. Almog, J. Perry, & H. Wettstein (eds.) Themes from Kaplan: pp. 481–563.
[32] Lasersohn, P. 2012 “Contextualism and Compositionality.” Linguistics and Philosophy, Vol. 35.2: pp. 171-189.
[33] Perry, J. 1986. “Thought without Representation.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes: pp. 137-166.
[34] Recanati, F. 2010. Truth Conditional Pragmatics. Oxford University Press.
[35] Stanley, J. 2002. “Making It Articulated.” Mind & Language 17: pp. 149-168.

i. Idioms

Readers interested in idioms should begin with [36] and follow its bibliography for more references.

[36] Nunberg, G., Sag, I., Wasow, T. 1994. “Idioms.” Language, Vol. 70, No. 3: pp. 491-538.

j. Noun Modification

Noun compounds, possessives, and modification of nouns with color adjectives provide instructive case studies regarding how philosophers, linguists, and psychologists confront apparently non-compositional phenomena. [37] is a classic, accessible source for observation, experiment, and linguistic analysis of noun compounds. [41] defends the thesis that compound [N1 N2] means “N2 somehow related to a N1 or N1s,” and [44] defends a hidden indexical solution. [40] is a good overview of the issues regarding the semantic treatment of possessives. A number of papers by Travis, including [43], have articulated the problem color adjectives present for the compositionality of truth-conditions. [42] presents a hidden indexical solution, and [38] attempts to use more standard resources to solve the problem. The psychological literature on noun modification typically eschews compositional treatments and goes under the heading “conceptual combination.” [39] is a review of the major psychological theories of processing modified nouns.

[37] Downing, P. 1977. “On the Creation and Use of English Compound Nouns.” Language 53.4: pp. 810-842.
[38] Kennedy, C. & McNally, L. 2010. “Color, Context, and Compositionality.” Synthese 174.1: pp. 79-98.
[39] Murphy, G. 2002. “Conceptual Combination.” In his The Big Book of Concepts. The MIT Press: pp. 443-75.
[40] Partee, B. “Chapter 15: Some Puzzles of Predicate Possessives.” In her Compositionality in Formal Semantics: Selected Papers by Barbara Partee. John Wiley & Sons.
[41] Sainsbury, R. 2001. “Two ways to smoke a cigarette.” Ratio 14: pp. 386-406.
[42] Szabó, Z. 2001. “Adjectives in Context.” In I. Kenesei & R Harnish (eds.) Perspectives on Semantics, Pragmatics and Discourse: A Festschrift for Ferenc Kiefer. Amsterdam: John Benjamins: pp. 119-146.
[43] Travis, C. 1997. “Pragmatics.” In B. Hale & C. Wright (eds.) A Companion to the Philosophy of Language. Blackwell: pp. 87-107.
[44] Weiskopf, D. 2007. “Compound Nominals, Context, and Compositionality.” Synthese, 156: pp. 161-204.

k. Additional Problems

There are a number of additional phenomena that have been seen as challenges to the principle of compositionality. Quotation as a problem for the principle of compositionality goes back at least to [18]. [45] presents a unique attempt to give a compositional treatment of quotation. [46] and [48] include treatments of so-called “donkey sentences.” The representations assigned by Kamp’s Discourse Representation Theory ([48] and other work) are unabashedly non-compositional. [47] and [49] involve a challenge for compositionality involving the interaction of ‘unless’ with quantifiers.

[45] Davidson, D. 1968. “On Saying That.” Synthese 19: pp. 130-146.
[46] Heim, I. 1982. The Semantics of Definite and Indefinite Noun Phrases. Ph.D. dissertation. Department of Linguistics. University of Massachusetts, Amherst.
[47] Higginbotham, J. 1986. “Linguistic Theory and Davidson’s Program in Semantics.” In E. Lepore (ed.) The Philosophy of Donald Davidson: Perspectives on Truth and Interpretation. Oxford: Blackwell.
[48] Kamp, H. 1981. “A Theory of Truth and Semantic Representation”. In: J. Groenendijk, T. Janssen & M. Stokhof (eds.) Formal Methods in the Study of Language. Mathematical Centre Tracts 135, Amsterdam: pp. 277-322.
[49] Pelletier, F. “On an Argument against Semantic Compositionality.” In D. Prawits & D. Westerståhl (eds.) Logic and Philosophy of Science in Uppsala. Kluwer: pp. 599-610.

l. Additional References

[50] Bittner, M. 1995. “Quantification in Eskimo: A Challenge for Compositional Semantics.” In E. Bach, E. Jelinek, A. Kratzer, B. Partee (eds.), Quantification in Natural Language. Kluwer: pp. 59–80.

Author Information

Michael Johnson
Email: michael.dracula.johnson@gmail.com
Hong Kong University
Hong Kong

Chinese Philosophy: Overview of Topics

If Chinese philosophy may be said to have begun around 2000 B.C.E., then it represents the longest continuous heritage of philosophical reflection. Trying to mention each philosopher or every significant thinker is not possible. This article is highly selective by choosing philosophers according to two basic principles: (1) Those who are the most representative of the key contributions of China to philosophical topics worldwide, and (2) those who made substantial redirections on a fundamental question of philosophy. Excluded are those who followed the grammar and approach from earlier thinkers, and who engaged more specifically in what might be called internecine debates and refinements.

The positions of the thinkers covered are grouped under the topics of ontology, epistemology, moral theory, and political philosophy. Fundamental questions belonging to these categories show up in Chinese philosophy, just as they do in Western thought. There are questions Chinese thinkers do not ask or do not approach in the same way as Western philosophers, so gaining an appreciation for why Chinese philosophy has sometimes followed a different path from that taken in the West is itself instructive. This overview is designed to pique the interest of readers, encouraging them to pursue the ways in which Chinese thinkers have made significant contributions to topics of interest in world philosophy.

Ontology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Composition of Reality
Epistemology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Scope of Knowledge
Moral Theory: Fundamental Questions on Morality
Political Philosophy: Fundamental Questions on Society and Government
Epilogue
References and Further Reading

1. Ontology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Composition of Reality

Western philosophy often takes the theory of reality (ontology) as equivalent to metaphysics, but this term does not fit for Chinese philosophy as it implies there is something beyond nature that creates and guides reality from the outside. While Chinese philosophical thought has a wide variety of ontologies, it has not stressed metaphysics in the traditional Western sense. Some ontological questions Chinese philosophers have considered are these: What is reality composed of? Is reality a single type of thing (monism), two types of things (dualism, such as minds and bodies; matter and spirit), or many kinds of things (pluralism)? Is reality composed only of transient things in constant change or are there eternal substances that form its content? Is reality actually as it appears to us, or is it something different than what we think it is? Is reality teleological; that is, is it “purposing” or going toward an end? Is the process of reality guided by a mind or intelligence to occur as it does, or does it follow some internal pattern of its own nature, or do humans attach meaning or purpose to a reality that is devoid of any inherent meaning?

a. Formation of the Early Chinese Worldview

In the period from the beginning of the Zhou dynasty (c. 1045 B.C.E.) to the beginning of the Han dynasty (206 B.C.E.), a number of classical Chinese texts were compiled. These are known now as the “Five Classics” (wujing), and they became enshrined as texts in the educational system of China for hundreds of years. In their received form, all of them have composite elements and some may well reflect the concerns and contexts of later (more in the Han dynasty period) rather than earlier (more in the Zhou dynasty) periods. Despite the uncertain dating of many passages and themes, these texts contain a substantial amount of material that is traceable to the pre-Qin (pre-221 B.C.E.) period, even reaching back to Confucius’s era (551-479 B.C.E.) or before.

The ontology of early Chinese thought comes down to us through a number of philosophical texts which are not traceable to any single author. Included among these are: the “Great Commentary” to the Classic of Changes (Yijing), the Chronicles of Zuo (Zuozhuan), and the “Great Plan” (Hong Fan) section of the Classic of History (Shujing).

i. The Classic of Changes (Yijing) and Its Place in Chinese Philosophy

The Classic of Changes (Yijing) is a complete edited work in two parts. One part is a manual of divination known simply as the Changes (Yi), or more correctly, as the Zhouyi. It is a handbook traceable to the period and practices of the Western Zhou dynasty as indicated, among other features, by its use of language expressions found on the bronzes of that period (c. 1046-771 B.C.E.). The other part of the Classic of Changes is a set of seven commentaries. Three of the commentaries are composed of two sections each. Taken as a whole, the commentary of this second part is known as “The Ten Wings” (Shiyi).

One of the commentaries is known as the Great Commentary (Dazhuan). It is arguably the most important text to study for an understanding of early Chinese ontology. The Classic of Changes as a whole is much less valuable for this purpose.

Regrettably, a determinable date for the composition of the Great Commentary cannot be fixed. However, a version of it was discovered as a silk manuscript among the archaeological finds at the Mawangdui tomb site in Changsha in 1973. Therefore, it must be older than 168 B.C.E. when the tomb was closed. The work makes use of the fundamental philosophical vocabulary of Chinese ontology that continues to be used by Chinese thinkers up to the early modern period. It speaks of Heaven (tian) and earth (di) collectively (tiandi) as a way of talking about “reality”. As for the process of reality’s change, it employs the term dao as a nominative and portrays it as operating according patterns (tian wen) or Principle(s) (li). In this commentary, the substance of reality (qi) is capable of transforming into a myriad of experienced objects, evidencing properties of what might be called in the West “matter” or in other forms “spirit.” Qi is moved by pushes and pulls of its internal opposing forces, yin and yang (Great Commentary Part I, 1, 4). Although reality’s changes are not arbitrary, neither are they guided by a mind or divine intellect. The Great Commentary associates the patterns (li) that give order to reality with the hexagrams found in the divination manual (the Zhouyi). The general philosophical term for the process of reality is “correlative ontology”. Various correlations are possible; for example, yin and yang may be mutually supportive, or one may be transforming the other, balancing it, compensating for it, enhancing it, or furthering something new in relation to the other.

In Western philosophy, the characteristic approach to ontology is to think of things that compose reality as “natural kinds,” each of which has a different essence that makes it what it is; for example, the essence of a chair, a cat, a tree, and so forth. This defining essence is typically called “the nature” of the object. In early Chinese ontology, change and process are more fundamental than continuity and endurance, even if there is sufficient constancy to speak of objects through time. The characteristic configuration of qi that something is actualizing (dao-ing) sets it apart from other things. This distinctive correlation of yin and yang does the philosophical work of the Western concept of essence. It enables identification of kinds and categories of things, without recourse to an ontology in which there is a pluralism of essentially different sorts of substances.

Chinese philosophers inheriting the ontology of the Yijing and Great Commentary still use the concept of the “nature” (xing) of something, but “nature” does not refer to some underlying essence or immaterial substance that makes something what it is in distinction from other things. “Nature” is a way of talking about the manner of qi correlation that actualizes a thing as it is and sets it apart from the correlations of other things.

ii. The Chronicles of Zuo (Zuozhuan, c. 389 B.C.E.)

The Chronicles of Zuo is a record of occurrences of the Spring and Autumn Period (771-468 B.C.E.) that traditionally has been ascribed to Zuo Qiuming, a court writer who lived in the State of Lu during the time of Confucius. The text is arranged as comments on the reign of various Marquis and Dukes and it was likely completed no later than 389 B.C.E.

Remarking on the 7^th year of the reign of Duke Wen (626-609 B.C.E.) the Chronicles of Zuo says: “Water, fire, metal, wood, earth, and grains are called the six natural resources (liu fu, or “six treasures”)”. The character fu is used to denote them. This list of six contains the five phasal elements (wuxing) of wood (mu), fire (huo), earth (tu), metal (jin), and water (shui). We see these in later ontological works but with the addition of the grains. The wuxing correlative ontology refers to a conceptual scheme that is found in traditional Chinese thought. Its elements are regarded as dynamic, interdependent modes or aspects of the universe’s ongoing existence and development. All objects of reality are some combination and in interdependent operation of these five. In comments on the 27^th year of the reign of Duke Xiang (590-573 B.C.E.) the text says: “Heaven has given birth to the five materials (wu cai) which supply humankind’s requirements, and the people use them all. Not one of them can be dispensed with.”

iii. The “Great Plan” in the Classic of History (Shujing)

In the “Great Plan” chapter of the Classic of History the compilers are interested in explaining how society should follow the patterns (li) of Heaven and earth. To do so, they provide the reader with information about these patterns, which offers substantial content about the ontology of the period. For example, in speaking of the nine divisions of the “Great Plan” by which Heaven orders reality, the text refers to the five phasal elements that are the building blocks for all real objects (Classic of History, “Great Plan” 2.2). The chapter does not spell out how the interdependencies of these five phases work, it only says they exist. It is made clear, though, that if humans do not behave in the proper manner, they can disrupt the harmonious operation of these phases, illness and weakness will arise in the body, and disorder will show up in nature and the human world of history.

b. Mozi, (fl. 470-391 B.C.E.)

While a study of Mozi’s (Mo Di or Master Mo) moral thought is paramount to understanding Chinese philosophy, his views on ontology, especially as they are set out in Books 8-37 and 46-49 of the Mozi, are sometimes overlooked. An understanding of Mozi’s views on reality begins with what he has to say about Heaven (tian). In classical Chinese, the word tian has many uses. When used as “Heaven and earth,” it is typically a reference to reality or all that is. Tian used alone is a nominative for the sky or a more or less numinous person.

Not surprisingly, then, the Mozi text often describes Heaven as though it is an agent that acts with intentions (yi, zhi) and desires (yu) (for example, in chapters 26-28). Heaven is praised as impartial, generous, wise, and just. It cares for humans and benefits the worthy by providing resources and blessings. Heaven has a dao that orders all things, including its relations with humanity. To use a comparable philosophical concept from the West for Mozi would be to say that Heaven is providential. Moreover, the source of a universal morality that overcomes and corrects human ethical conceptions is Heaven’s will mediated through the ruler.

Holding such a view is one of the reasons why Mozi is committed to a rejection of the philosophical position that the happenings in the course of reality’s process are predestined or fated (ming). Mozi’s arguments on this subject are gathered in the “Against Fate” chapters (35-37) of his text. A principal argument used by Mozi against the position that reality is fated is a pragmatic one. He holds that accepting such a position would mean that one’s status, health, wealth, success, and longevity are already determined and not consequences of one’s effort or choices in life. Taking this view would lead to disaster (37.10). In fact, Mozi says the concept of fate should be regarded as a creation of evil kings and peasant farmers. His point is that some kings used this philosophical idea as a means to justify their positions of power and wealth, while the peasants used it to explain why their reduced situation in life was not a result of living wrongly, or failing to better themselves; that is, it was fated that they be poor. This explains in part why Mozi considered the ontological concept of ming (fate) to be one a philosopher must reject.

c. Lao-Zhuang Daoist Ontology (c. 350-139 B.C.E.)

To speak collectively of “Lao-Zhuang” tradition is to identify a set of philosophical sentiments and positions in common between the two classical works of emergent Daoism in Chinese intellectual history: the Daodejing (DDJ) and the Zhuangzi (ZZ). Both the Daodejing associated with Laozi and the Zhuangzi ascribed to Zhuang Zhou (369-289 B.C.E.) are composite works not written by a single author. Throughout the classical period, there were many lineages of teachers and disciples, as well as multiple oral and written versions of transmitted materials that came together to form these texts. There was no unified, coherent school called Daoism in the classical period, but the term Lao-Zhuang can be used to capture the family resemblances between lineages and their transmitted teachings.

We have already noticed in our survey of the earliest Chinese ontologies that reality (that is, “Heaven and earth”) is a constant process, but the changes are not haphazard. The Chinese term used to capture the order reality exhibits is dao, which literally means the ‘way’ or ‘path’ that the changing process of reality displays. In this process, there are patterns and principles that are evident to one who reflects on the dao. The dao of qi (the energy which composes all things) gives rise to itself and to forces that move it. It is self-moving, according to the dynamic energies of yin and yang.

The term dao is one of the most important concepts in the Daodejing. Sometimes it is used as a noun (“the Dao”) and other times as a verb (“dao-ing”). According to the Daodejing, the dao has a power in itself from which all things have come (DDJ 42). There is a confidence expressed in the text that the process of the dao of reality is at a minimum benign (DDJ, 37 says dao leaves nothing undone). In fact, it is untangling knots that humans create, as well as blunting the sharp edges constructed by those who are resisting or moving contrary to dao. There is a very close association of dao with Heaven (tian) that benefits and does not harm (DDJ 73, 77, 81). When we look closely at the Daodejing’s remarks about Heaven they make it clear that a critical move is made in Chinese ontology by thinkers in this tradition. Heaven’s dao is life-furthering and full of benefit, but is are without deliberation or plan. Still, unlike the Mozi’s Heaven, dao has no mind: It is not planning or working by a design toward a goal it is trying to reach. It is acting spontaneously, but neither is it leaving loose ends or causing problems, disorder, or confusion.

In the sections of the Zhuangzi anthology that come from the master teacher, Zhuang Zhou, these matters are expressed in a very literary way. For dao the text often uses “The Great Clod” by which all things come into being (ZZ Ch. 2). But when using dao, the Zhuangzi says it lacks form but is its own root, and it gave birth to Heaven and earth and all things (ZZ Ch. 6).

The point being made in both the Daodejing and Zhuangzi is the dao is beyond language and cognitive categories of space and time. It is not in any space nor has it any temporal description. As such dao functions as what philosophers call a “limiting concept”. Asking when dao began serves no purpose because time does not apply to it; neither does speculating about where it exists because it is not in any particular place.

The Zhuangzi does not make any specific reference to the five phasal elements ontology used in the “Great Plan” probably because it was in development at the same time that Zhuangzi text was being formed. It makes clear, however, that all things are changing and being transformed, and that people can have some involvement in their own transformations (ZZ Ch. 6, 7).

d. Correlative Cosmologies in the Han Period: Yinyang and Wuxing Heuristics

According to Sima Tan (d. 110 B.C.E.), during the Spring and Autumn and Warring States (403-221 B.C.E.) periods a school existed that bore the name yinyang. He lists this yinyang school alongside others such as the Confucian, Mohist, Legalist, and Daoist. According to him, this school focused on divination and explored the patterns of Heaven and earth. This school almost certainly had its antecedents in the Zhouyi and was likely a theoretical and heuristic extension of many of the practices associated with that text.

By the Han dynasty (202 B.C.E.-220 C.E.), yinyang thought was associated with the standardization of wuxing (the five phasal elements) correlative cosmology associated with the work of Zou Yan (c. 305-240 B.C.E.). The synthesis of Confucianism, yinyang, and wuxing explanatory philosophies is evident in the writings of the scholar Dong Zhongshu (179-104 B.C.E.) and exhibited in his volume, Luxuriant Dew of the Spring and Autumn Annals (Chunqiu fanlu). The Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi) is also a primary representative text for correlative cosmology. Large sections of Chapters 2, 3, 7, and 20 depend heavily on this ontology for the cogency of the work’s argument about Heaven’s relation to human activity. Masters of Huainan, however, tends to blend Daoist sensibilities (especially Yellow-Emperor Daoist ideas) with yinyang and wuxing more prominently than did Dong Zhongshu’s work.

e. Selected Buddhist Ontologies

Scholars have debated two interpretations of how Buddhist missionaries first reached China in its southern regions: first, through maritime landings that spread up the Chang Jiang (Yangtze River) and the Huai waterway into the area of present day Jiangsu province under Prince Ying of Chu (c. 65 C.E.); and second, by moving overland along the northern Silk Road through the areas controlled by the Yuezhi central Asian peoples in what is now Xinjiang province and western Gansu province. The latter interpretation continues to have the greatest preponderance of evidence in its favor, along with long-standing traditions that the White Horse Temple in the Han capital of Luoyang (present day Henan province) was the first temple in China (c. 68 C.E.). However, it seems clear that Buddhism came into China by both routes.

China did not escape the diversity of Buddhist Madhyamika philosophical schools; many scholars have argued convincingly that Chinese thinkers did not realize for decades that the Buddhist texts coming from India represented different schools of thought and so they tried unsuccessfully to harmonize them into a single philosophical system. Gradually, Chinese thinkers created some distinctively Chinese approaches to and versions of the Buddhist schools and even began some schools that were indigenous to China.

i. Tiantai Buddhism (Zhiyi, 538-597 C.E.)

Unlike earlier schools of Chinese Buddhism, the Tiantai School was largely of Chinese origin. Tiantai flourished under its fourth patriarch, Zhiyi, who asserted that the Lotus Sutra (Fahua jing) contained the supreme teaching of Buddhism. The school derives its name from the Tiantai mountain that served as its base. The most distinctive ontological claim of Tiantai is that there is only one reality that is both the phenomenal existence of everyday experience and nirvana itself. This is a significant divergence from many early Buddhist teachings in India that drew a sharp demarcation between the phenomenal world and the world of nirvana. In Tiantai, there is not only one reality but also it is ultimately empty. The reason all things are empty is that literally every object and real thing (that is, every dharma) exists as it is through an indefinite number of interdependent causes. Nothing has its own nature or essence that underlies or exists apart from the interplay of all these causes. Accordingly, all things have only tentative existence, and they are impermanent.

Humans experience phenomenal reality as various forms of pain and suffering, happiness and contentment, and may also realize overwhelming enlightenment and peace. In fact, Tiantai writings describe ten ways of existing in reality, but these do not reflect any interest in the kinds of extrapolations offered in the other Chinese ontologies, such as dao, yin and yang, or the elaborate five phasal elements system.

The Ten Ways of Existing in Reality According to Tiantai Buddhism1. Hell Beings2. Hungry Ghosts3. Beasts (non-human animals)4. Asuras (demons)5. Human Beings

6. Gods or celestial creatures

7. Voice-hearers (Skravakas)

8. Self-enlightened Ones (Pratyekabuddhas)

9. Bodhisattvas

10. Buddhas

In Tiantai ontology, the reality that Hell Beings inhabit is the same reality in which the Buddhas live. There is no supernatural boundary between these ways of existing; nor are there opposing spiritual realms such as Heaven and Hell. Living and working next to us may be one who is a Hell Being, or a Bodhisattva, or even a Buddha. The goal is not to depart this world and go into some other transcendent reality. It is to exist as a Buddha in this world. There is no other reality except this one; reality is one.

In Tiantai, every human has the capacity to live in reality as a Buddha. Living as such does not make one eternal; every existing thing will be extinct in the form in which it now exists. This is a reflection of the empty nature of reality; the only reality that there is. At the same time, Tiantai does not deny physical reality; it is no Idealism. Rather, it is a form of ontological Realism, confident that manifold concrete yet fundamentally empty things exist, but they may realize sublimity in this life.

ii. Consciousness-only Buddhism (Weishi Zong)

The version of Chinese Buddhism known as Consciousness-only was called Yogacara in India. The monk Xuanzang (c. 602–664), born Chen Hui, was principally responsible for its popularization in China through his translations of texts he brought from India. His travels there are recorded in detail in the classic Chinese text Great Tang Records on the Western Regions, which in turn provided the inspiration for the imaginative spiritual journey novel Journey to the West, written by Wu Cheng’en during the Ming dynasty (1368-1644), around nine centuries after Xuanzang’s death.

The central ontological tenet of Consciousness-only Buddhism is that nothing exists except consciousness. Reality is the flow of experiences and awareness of ideas is called perception. Perceptions are not caused by things external to humans such as concrete or material objects that continue whether humans are conscious of them or not. In ontological language, this is called Idealism, which contrasts with the Realism of Tiantai. In its original context in India, the Consciousness-only teachings were direct contradictions to the prevailing Indian physics of reality that all things (dharmas) are constructed from the atoms of earth, water, fire and air. It also stood in radical contrast to Chinese thought about qi and the five phases.

In Consciousness-only teaching, when a person is born, thereby becoming conscious, individual experience is not funded by encounters with objects in an external world but by something Xuanzang called the “storehouse consciousness”. Every deed that has ever been done and every idea that anyone has had is contained in this consciousness. No dharma (experienced idea) exists by itself, and any alteration in the way other ideas cause it to exist would be a different experience entirely. This is what is meant by the concept of “dependent co-arising” in Consciousness-only philosophy.

Still, not all consciousness is of the same level of development; some forms are higher than others. As the levels of consciousness advance, they “perfume” the highest level of consciousness into being. “Perfuming” in this philosophy is a unique ontological approach to causality, quite different from Aristotle’s discussions of cause and John Stuart Mill’s remarks on the determination of cause.

f. The Neo-Confucian Synthesis of Zhu Xi (1130-1200)

Beginning in the early 11^th century, a group of interdependent philosophers began to reconstruct Chinese philosophy by using a new grammar. They sought to merge Confucian thought with Daoist and Buddhist concepts. While they surely thought of themselves as Confucian, and valorized Confucius and Mencius (c. 372-289 B.C.E.) in their writings, it is clear that they were doing something novel with their appropriation of classical Confucian ideas. Accordingly, they are grouped together as “Neo-Confucians”. This family of thought included philosophers such as Zhang Zai (1020-1077), Cheng Hao (1032-1085), and Cheng Yi (1033-1107).

Without doubt, Zhu Xi is the most influential of these thinkers. His philosophy set the parameters of philosophical conversation on ontology throughout East Asia for over 400 years. Western philosophers of the same stature would include Aristotle in the Classical period, Thomas Aquinas in the Medieval period, and Immanuel Kant in the Enlightenment period. Zhu Xi’s systematization of the Confucian Way (dao) also became a coherent program of education for centuries in China, Korea, and Japan.

Zhu Xi’s extensive philosophical work rests on the foundation of his theory of reality. The place to begin understanding his ontology is in Xi’s following statement: “Everything that has shape and form is “concrete existence” qi. That which constitutes the Principle(s) (li) of “concrete existence” is the Way (dao)” (Collected Writings of Chu Hsi 36.14).

Several philosophical questions arise in Zhu Xi’s ontology. Did he think of Principle(s) as singular or plural? What should be included in Principle(s) when he uses this as an ontological concept? Does Principle(s) refer to something like the logical scaffolding of reality (that is, its design, order, logical structure, or pattern)? Does Zhu Xi use Principle(s) to mean something like the natural laws discoverable by chemistry, physics, and the like? Are Principle(s) in Zhu’s ontology similar to what Kant called the “categories of the mind” (causality, space, time, and so forth). Does Principle(s) sometimes mean “moral principles or norms” that are universally binding and true for all persons? Zhu Xi sometimes uses Principle(s) in one of these senses and sometimes in another. It is not possible to reduce his remarks on Principle(s) to any one of these exclusively. Likewise, the term is sometimes used in a singular and sometimes as a plural in his writings.

For Zhu Xi, the Principle(s) of reality reside in the Supreme Ultimate. But this is not a thing or a being. Rather, before shapes and things began to exist, the Supreme Ultimate from which they came had the principles of shape and order, but was not itself any shape or form. Neither is it a “blank” (wu). It cannot be said to exist (yu) as one thing alongside others. It existed before Heaven and earth. Although the noted scholar Feng Youlan takes Zhu Xi’s discussion of Principle(s) to be a version of what Plato called the Forms (see his A Short History of Chinese Philosophy), such a reading is arguable. It is not as though a brick is an expression of the Platonic Form of a brick. Rather, a brick is the result of a specific five-phase configuration ‘bricking’ (as a verb of action) according to Principle(s) that are universally shared by all things. The Supreme Ultimate is a concept used for talking collectively about the Principle(s) governing the five phases and yin and yang. On this reading, Principle(s) enable concrete configurations of qi to yield the myriad things that furnish reality.

Zhu Xi’s ontology may be considered a form of Naturalism, rather than Theism. The Supreme Ultimate is not God in the Western sense or Plato’s Form of the Good. However, neither is it reducible to or the product of the other cosmological operators in Zhu’s thought such as qi, yin, yang, or the five phases.

g. Wang Yangming (1472-1529)

The principal sources for Wang Yangming’s ideas are his Instructions for Practical Living (Chuan Xilu, 1518) and “Inquiry on the Great Learning” (1527). The latter work offers a succinct summary of the main themes he developed throughout his life.

Wang is often understood to be an ontological Idealist. But he makes it clear that he is not an Idealist in a famous story where he points out to a friend the flowering trees on a cliff. The friend assumes that Wang’s position is a form of Idealism. He then challenges Wang by claiming the flowers are independent from his mind. Wang’s reply makes his ontology clear. He says that before the friend looked at the flowering trees, they were simply there in their vacancy, but when the friend experiences them, he thinks of them as a tree, a cliff, and flowers. Thus, as the experienced “world” they are not at all independent of his friend’s mind. They cannot be “flowers on a cliff” without the mind.

Why is this? For Wang, the reason is very clear. It is because human minds are inherently patterning. Known as the Human minds Principle (li), this patterning that makes things as they are into a universe or reality. Otherwise, there are only concrete things (qi) moving around; there is really no “world”. So, Wang is not denying the existence of concrete things as in Idealism but he is insisting that these things are not without the patterning that the mind brings to experience.

When human minds do this patterning it is not always a conscious or deliberative process. Likewise, individuals also do not “know” the Principles by which they engage in the process. Rather, in the most truthful experiences, human minds are one with Heaven and earth, and the Principles are applied directly by “pure intelligence” (liangzhi), not through the mediation of data from the five senses, or by discursive reason, or the authority of any book or philosophical teacher.

There is a fundamental difference, though, between Wang’s position and that of Zhu Xi. Wang does not set Principle(s) in a transcendent sense apart from concrete things. In fact, he gives them no existence apart from the human mind. If there were no human mind, there would be no “world.”

h. Shifting Paradigms in Chinese Ontology

i. Dai Zhen (1723-1777)

Dai Zhen’s two most prominent philosophical works are entitled On the Good (Yuanshan) and An Evidential Study of the Meaning and Terms of the Mencius (Mengzi ziyi shuzheng). Some interpreters hold that Dai Zhen was responsible for a major paradigm shift in Chinese thinking on ontology. He completely removed the transcendent aspect from Principle(s) (li), and this is certainly a shift from Zhu’s understanding. Furthermore, Dai did not think that Principle(s) were independent of concrete things as Zhu did, but neither did he think they were an activity of the human mind as Wang believed. Instead, he conceived of Principle(s) as the internal order (tiao) or pattern (wen) of things-in-themselves.

To use Western philosophical terms, Dai’s thinking is as a form of teleological naturalism. Purpose, pattern, and design are not imposed on reality by human beings, but neither do they derive from a transcendent realm that is wholly other than the natural process itself. Instead, they are a part of the very nature of the stuff of reality itself.

Some interpreters of Dai characterize his position by means of a rather distinctive Chinese example. A method used to determine the authenticity of a piece of jade in China is to hold it up to the light and observe whether veins can be seen in its translucence. If so, the jade is authentic. If not, it is an imitation and a fake. Accordingly, Dai may be interpreted to be saying that concrete objects have such analogous striations and these are the Principle(s) that give order to reality.

ii. Hu Shi (1891-1962)

Hu Shi was a key figure in the New Culture Movement that introduced ideas from the West to China. This movement developed the slogans “Mr. Science” and “Mr. Democracy” to describe Western learning (Xi xue). Hu specifically acknowledged the influence of Thomas Huxley and John Dewey on his thought, and he was a contemporary with some of the most prominent Western philosophers, including Ludwig Wittgenstein and Martin Heidegger. He has been called the central figure in 20^th century Chinese academic thought.

Hu studied in a Western-style system in Shanghai, being particularly impressed by the Darwinian theory of evolution. Later, he studied in America at Cornell and Columbia University, where John Dewey became his dissertation supervisor. While still a young student in Shanghai, he summarized the changes in his conception of life in the universe from the Chinese ontology with which he was raised. Published in 1923, he entitled this summary the “New Credo”. Its includes the following points:

On the basis of knowledge of astronomy and physics, people should recognize that the world of space is infinitely large.
On the basis of geological and paleontological knowledge, people should recognize that the universe extends over infinite time.
On the basis of all verifiable scientific knowledge, people should recognize that the universe and everything in it follow natural laws of movements in change. So, what is “natural” is the Chinese sense of “being so of its self” and there is no need for the concept of a supernatural Ruler or Creator.
On the basis of the biological sciences, people should recognize the terrific wastefulness and brutality in the struggle for existence in the biological world and consequently the untenability of the hypothesis of a benevolent Ruler.
On the basis of the biological, physiological, and psychological sciences, people should recognize that man is only one species in the animal kingdom that differs from the other species only in degree, but not in kind.
On the basis of the knowledge derived from anthropology, sociology, and the biological sciences, people should understand the history and causes of the evolution of living organisms and of human society.
On the basis of the biological and psychological sciences, people should recognize that all psychological phenomena could be explained through the law of causality.
On the basis of biological and historical knowledge, people should recognize that morality and religion are subject to change and that the causes of such change can be scientifically studied.
On the basis of newer knowledge of physics and chemistry, people should recognize that matter is full of motion and not static.
On the basis of biological, sociological, and historical knowledge, people should recognize that the individual self is subject to death and decay. But the sum total of individual achievement, for better or for worse, lives on in the immortality of the Larger Self. That to live for the sake of the species and posterity is religion of the highest kind; and that those religions that seek a future life either in Heaven or in the Pure Land are selfish religions.

Hu Shi calls this credo “The Naturalistic Conception of Life and the Universe”. This work, which he saw as a turn from Chinese philosophy leading up to the 20^th century, illustrates his commitment to the experimental sciences. He continued to embrace this credo throughout his life.

2. Epistemology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Scope of Knowledge

Some epistemological questions are these: What is it “to know”? Can we know something to be true, or do we only believe things to be true (skepticism)? Are all knowledge claims of the same sort? Are they justified in the same way? What are the tools we use to know something (reason, senses, direct apprehension, and so forth)? Do we possess innate knowledge? Is there a limit to what we can know?

a. The Mozi, Later Mohists and Debaters (bianshi)

In his rejection of the commonly held belief that reality is fated (ming), Mozi’s students asked him to set out the philosophical bases for knowing how to judge between views. In general, the response he makes to this question serves as a reasonable outline for his theory of how to establish a claim’s truth. He insists that knowledge must be pursued by means of three criteria (Mozi 35.5). Mozi’s first test for judging between knowledge claims is what we may call an examination of the received belief about the claim. This is understood as what the historical records report. The second truth test is what Mozi calls “the evidence of the eyes and ears of the common people”. He takes this to mean direct experiential testimony to the truth of a claim. His third test for determining truth is that the truth of a claim rests on observing whether acting on the claim yields the expected results, which should obtain if it is true.

Applying these three criteria leads Mozi to accept the claim that ghosts and spirits exist. He argues that received knowledge includes the intervention and existence of spirits as explanatory devices and that there is widespread testimony to the presence of such phenomena. Most importantly, however, Mozi feels that the pragmatic implications of giving up such a belief would be disastrous; cruelty, robbery, and warfare, for Mozi, are common precisely because people have come to doubt whether ghosts and spirits exist or not. He says, “If all the people of the world could be brought to believe that ghosts and spirits are able to reward the worthy and punish the wicked, then how could the world be in disorder?” (Mozi 31.1)

Mozi’s students, and their students, developed his interest in how we know something to be true in the years following his life. In Records of the Grand Historian, Sima Tan (d. 110 B.C.E.) identified a group of thinkers he called Mingjia (名家, School of Names). These thinkers have been variously classified as debaters, rhetoricians, dialecticians, logicians, and skeptics. In the Warring States Period (c. 475-221 B.C.E.), however, the name used more generally for thinkers occupied with such epistemological questions was bianshi 辯士 (often rendered as “disputers” or “rhetoricians”). The approaches and arguments of the bianshi can be associated with the work of the so-called Later Mohist philosophers. We know this group of thinkers largely through the final six chapters of the Mozi text (Chapters 40-45), which form an entirely different unit than the earlier sections of the work.

Outside the Mozi text, the ideas of two of the bianshi are known to us through sources which we may have some degree of confidence: Hui Shi (307?-210? B.C.E.) and Gongsun Longzi (b. 380? B.C.E.). Hui Shi shows up in nine chapters of the Zhuangzi. The text Gongsun Longzi is attributed to Gongsun Long. (For an English translation see Mei Yi-Pao (1953)). It is nearly certain that later bianshi would not have accepted Mozi’s position that ghost and spirits exist.

b. Lao-Zhuang Traditions on Knowing and Truth

There is much in the Lao-Zhuang tradition that seems to suggest anti-intellectualism and anti-rationalism. It is said that sages make sure the people are without knowledge (DDJ 3), those who pursue the dao are cautioned to abandon learning (DDJ 20), states are said to be difficult to rule because the people “know too much” (DDJ 65), and the knowledgeable are contrasted unfavorably with the enlightened (DDJ 33). Moreover, wuwei as a distinctive form of conduct is a teaching without words (DDJ 43) and comes through an experience of numinal vision and confirmation (DDJ 10). However, these passages do not set out a form of anti-intellectualism. Interpreted in their context, they are part of the Lao-Zhuang insistence that the distinctions and concepts by which reason works are of human design, which may mislead people about the nature of reality or tangle them in problems they create themselves. Reason, evidence and argument have their place, but they do not extend to the fullness of freedom and happiness achieved in following the dao.

The Zhuangzi, too, seems opposed to critical inquiry and application of reason and logic. People are cautioned not to wear out their brains with distinctions (ZZ ch. 2). The text uses many examples to point out that what a person thinks he knows is really relative to context and not absolute, and what a person knows is nothing compared to what he does not know (ZZ ch. 17). People are warned that skillfulness in argument culminating in “winning” the point is not equivalent to arriving at truth (ZZ ch. 2). Rhetoricians and logicians are compared to nimble monkeys and rat-catching dogs (ZZ ch. 12). They are skillful at rational gymnastics, but poor at realizing truth. Instead, truth comes through stillness, emptying oneself of rational and human distinctions (that is, naturalness) and direct receptivity of the presence of dao (ZZ ch. 21). For all the affection and friendship between them, Zhuangzi did not approve of the bianshi thinker Hui Shi’s approach to knowledge.

In this tradition, the power to master life and the ability to control one’s transformation is not an achievement of reason. This is not the same as saying that the Lao-Zhuang teachers had no use for reason and sense evidence. Truth comes from oneness with dao. When realized, one flows in life spontaneously and effortlessly, without thought, just like the famous butcher of the Inner Chapters, Cook Ding, who cuts up an ox without ever hitting a bone or dulling his knife (ZZ ch. 3).

c. Mencius (Mengzi, c. 372-289 B.C.E.) and Analogical Reasoning

Although it is often said that classical Chinese philosophers did not place a premium on argumentation, Mencius was a master of the use and criticism of analogical argument. This was the most prevalent method of approaching knowledge and establishing truth among 4^th century B.C.E. Chinese thinkers. Mencius often used this method in his criticisms of other philosophers such as Mozi, Gaozi, and Yangzi.

Analogical reasoning in this period included both the use of one thing to throw light on another and the use of one proposition known to be true to throw light on another of similar form, the truth of which was undetermined. Two advantages of this form of argument in the classical period have been identified. One is that an analogy is often as valuable epistemologically when it breaks down as when it works. The second is that analogy is often the only tool available for exploring a subject that is obscure or one that eludes direct experience. Mencius and his interlocutors carry on their debates in the Mengzi largely through the method of analogy.

One example of Mencius’s use of analogy is his famous exchange with Gaozi recorded in the Mengzi 6A2. In this passage, Gaozi criticizes Mencius’s view that human nature has an inborn tendency to seek goodness by saying that human nature is like water; it will seek whatever outlet is available, showing no preference for flowing East or West. While accepting the analogy between human nature and water, Mencius reminds Gaozi that although water does not prefer East to West, it most surely has the nature to flow downhill, rather than uphill. Likewise, Mencius concludes, human nature has the propensity to move toward the good, just as water seeks downhill.

d. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): Dispelling Obsessions

According to Sima Qian, Xunzi was once the leader of the Jixia Academy, a site where thinkers of the 100 schools (baijia) were represented. Xunzi made skillful appeals to both empirical and rational sources as necessary for arriving at knowledge. Yet, he held that discursive reason could not resolve quandaries if it excluded feeling and emotion, appealing to xin (heart-mind) as an arbiter of truth whenever it operated in a clear state (da qingming), setting aside presuppositions and amok emotion. To prevent such confusions in understanding, Xunzi turned to the concept of fa, meaning “criterion” or “standard”. He held that reasoning, whether analytically making distinctions or synthesizing diverse positions, operates by rules that approximate the way in which a geometer might judge a circle by using a compass. To know something is to be guided by these standards of reasoning to a conclusion. In Chapters 21and 22 of Xunzi, he says the heart-mind draws distinctions among reasons, explanations, and desires similarly to how the eye draws distinctions among colors. Xunzi insists that we never cease learning and investigating. It is just such cumulative knowledge that can save us from obsessions and superstitions, leading us to focus instead on activities that will create a more humane world.

e. Wang Chong (c. 25-100 C.E.): Critical Chinese Philosophy in the Classical Period

Wang Chong was a critic of many received views on ontology, morality, religion, and politics. His writings on these subjects were compiled into the work entitled Critical Essays (Lunheng). It reveals Wang’s critical and somewhat skeptical mind at work, and also his flair for originality in approaching philosophical problems at the end of the period of classical Chinese philosophy. Speaking of his own work, he says, “Although the chapters of my Critical Essays may only number in the tens, one phrase likewise covers them all, namely, ‘hatred of fictions and falsehoods’” (Critical Essays ch. 61).

Wang is keenly aware of the tensions between empirical and rational pursuits of truth, and he insists both must play a role in the advance of knowledge. One cannot depend only on experience because it can be deceptive; thus reason (xinyi) must be involved. He says bluntly that the Mohists did not use their minds to verify things, but indiscriminately believed what common people reported to have experienced. Thereby, the Mohists fell into deception (ch. 67). Moreover, against the Daoists he holds that history never affords any instances of men knowing what is true without inquiry and reasoning (ch. 2). However, Wang is also aware that one could make a coherent set of premises into a logical argument that nevertheless would contradict ordinary and uniform experience and thus be untrue.

In his practice of testing differing positions and claims, Wang often uses the method known in Chinese as “arguing from a lodging place”. This is similar to the strategy of assuming an opponent’s position “for the sake of argument”. Wang believes that by adopting this tactic he can most easily reveal the logical flaws or evidential weaknesses of a position he thinks is false. He frequently makes use of the reductio ad absurdum technique; that is, he shows that an untenable or absurd result follows from accepting the belief in question. His skillfulness in seeing the limitations of both reason and experience as sources for claims he considers weak is one explanation for why early sources, perhaps as a way of ridiculing Wang, wrongly grouped him with the qingtan (“pure talk”) masters, who were skilled rhetoricians and said to be more intent on making arguments rather than gaining truth.

Wang does not believe that all questions can be answered because he insists that one cannot find the truth on the basis of partial evidence alone. Here his approach brings into light the distinction between belief and truth. Many more things can be believed than can be known. Believing something is not “knowing” it. Wang’s use of the term xu as “false” refers to a belief of a certain type. He held that claims shown to be false do not attract us. No one knowingly believes a falsehood. But xu beliefs have not been conclusively falsified and they have attractive features, such as making us feel better about life events, or ourselves, and thus they are difficult to give up believing. Wang’s way of understanding xu helps us to make sense of passages in which he talks as if xu beliefs possess an attractiveness that entices the undisciplined mind.

Wang has no patience with what he considers to be the superstitions of his day, and he does not hesitate to criticize his predecessors, including Confucius, Mozi, Mencius, and those thinkers involved in trying to create a synthesis with the five-phase cosmology and its related belief systems. He uses argument and empirical evidence to criticize the worship of Confucius, to debunk belief in omens, to discount any evidential basis for fengshui, and to show the contradictions in a belief in ghosts and spirits. Wang argues that Heaven (tian) is merely a name for natural physical processes, which are not powers to be assuaged by ritual or prayer. Rather, they are processes to be studied through observation and reason.

f. Tiantai Buddhism’s Threefold Truth Epistemology

The defining thesis of Tiantai is actually epistemological. As advanced by the philosopher Zhiyi, it is the teaching of Threefold Truth (san di), which includes the following points. 1) We can make true statements about the world of ordinary objects. These truths are about things that exist and their interactions in a network of interdependent causes. These are the truths of history, science, and so forth, about provisional existence. 2) It is also true to say that all things are empty (kong di) and have no permanence. Everything in reality is devoid of any self-nature. Of course, it is the realization of this truth that liberates one from suffering because it breaks one’s attachment to things and persons who are the objects of our desires. 3) The mundane or phenomenal world is real, but it is also impermanent and ultimately empty. This is truth as the Middle Way (zhong di).

Zhiyi thought that persons had varying epistemological capabilities, which put them on different levels of knowledge. Some people are only able to grasp truth in its mundane expression. For them, truth enables engagement with the world and its pleasures, desires, and attachments. They suffer because of this, although they may resist desires through moral action, prayer, devotion and the like. Conversely, others express truth as per the Threefold teaching; that is, as emptiness. They detach from the mundane, living apart from it as much as possible. But for those who are capable of it, truth is seen for what it is, and yet they live in the mundane, knowing it is real; but also seeing its emptiness.

g. Wang Yangming on liangzhi: Direct, Clear, Universal Knowledge

Wang Yangming wrote, “What I mean by the investigation of things (gewu) and the extension of knowledge is to apply the pure knowledge (zhi liangzhi) of my mind to each and every thing.” According to Wang, even ordinary knowledge gained by the use of reason requires the direct and clear apprehension of Principle(s) (li) innate to human minds. However, there is also knowledge that cannot be acquired or transmitted by discursive reasoning. He once said to a disciple, “Knowledge acquired through personal realization is different from that acquired through listening to discussion. When I first lectured on the subject, I knew you took it lightly and were not interested. However, when one goes further and realizes this essential and wonderful thing personally to its depth, he will see that it becomes different every day [i.e., in its guiding power] and it is inexhaustible” (Instructions, sec. 11).

According to Wang Yangming’s biography, while exiled in the Guizhou region he experienced a kind of direct enlightenment or pure knowledge (liangzhi) after which he began teaching what he called “the unity of knowledge and action” (zhixing heyi). In liangzhi, one is impelled to act in a certain way. Following this, the person can be said to possess the knowledge of how to act. But there are not two events, one volitional and the other epistemological. The acting is the knowing.

In 20^th century Western philosophy, British thinkers wrote deliberately about the distinction between “knowing that” and “knowing how”. On these terms, Wang Yangming’s notion about the knowledge gained in liangzhi is a third concept, one that has affinities with both epistemology and action. Liangzhi is not a “faculty” of the mind or a special kind of “sense”. Nor is liangzhi the sort of knowledge by which one knows where to dig a well or when to plant crops. One cannot know everything by liangzhi, for example, whether there is evidence of water on Mars. Yet, Wang says that when our heart-mind is operating by liangzhi, a person is moved irresistibly to act freely from all obstruction caused by desires; and within acting lies knowing what to do.

h. Hu Shi (1891-1962): Pragmatism and Experimentalism

When John Dewey arrived in Shanghai on May 1, 1919, the story of Western philosophy’s impact on Chinese thought turned a new page; American Pragmatism’s influence on Chinese intellectual history had begun. Hu Shi claimed that no Western scholar up to that time had exerted the magnitude of Dewey’s influence.

Hu Shi’s contribution to epistemology in Chinese philosophy seems based largely on his adaptation of Dewey’s pragmatism, which Hu preferred to call “experimentalism”. Hu follows Dewey in thinking that the function of the concept of “truth” in the theory of knowledge is instrumental. This means that Hu Shi’s view of truth can be set apart from some other epistemological approaches. He does not think a claim is true if it corresponds to the way the world is; that is, if the claim expresses what humans see, feel, hear, and so forth. Rather, he thinks that saying a claim is true means that the claim may be employed as an instrument to deal with the environment and context of everyday life. True beliefs enable people to deal with life situations effectively and consistently. This means that as life realities change, so might the claims that are “true”. Thus truth is not a minted coin that never changes. He specifically uses this approach to free himself from the views of ancient Chinese sages and their writings, which he feels should be studied largely as historical artifacts and much less so as viable philosophical options.

However, Hu Shi’s view of truth, like Dewey’s, is no mere subjectivism. Instead of truth being something that is relative to the individual, Hu argues that a claim that something is true requires that it be demonstrated experimentally. He has, however, a very broad view of what counts as an experimental demonstration of a claim. By “experimental” he means demonstration according to the scientific method of experiment and confirmation. Yet, he regards this method as only one way of establishing a claim’s effects when it is true or disconfirming the claim when it is false. This way of proceeding has specific implications for his social theory. He thinks that claims being made about economics, politics, morality, and the social sciences can and should be confirmed experimentally by observing whether the observable outcomes of the claim’s being true or false can be confirmed in actual practice.

In the context of Chinese epistemologies, Hu stands out as opposing all kinds of authoritarianism and dogmatism; simply because Confucius or Zhu Xi or some other figure says something, it does not make it true in the current context.

i. Zhang Dongsun (1886-1973): Pluralistic Cultural Epistemology

In the early half of the 20^th century, Zhang Dongsun was one of the most important philosophers in China, especially owing to his efforts to establish, in dialogue with Western philosophy, a unique philosophical epistemology in the Chinese context. This approach has variously been labeled as Pluralistic Epistemology or Cultural Epistemology.

For Zhang, what counts as evidence, what we seek to know, what we think it is possible to know, what we notice through our senses, how we interpret our sense perceptions, and what qualifies as a sufficient reason to say we know something all represent epistemological positions that are inevitably culturally defined and structured. Persons are not merely acculturated to observe festivals, organize themselves socially, or valorize certain heroes. They are also shaped by their cultures to operate epistemologically in different ways.

The most obvious way in which all epistemology can be shown to be cultural is that knowledge is expressed in a particular language. Of course, language is a cultural product. Languages have grammar and structure, and these embody logic and rules for reasoning. For example, Zhang argued that the structure of Western languages leads philosophers to look for the substance underlying the attributes predicated of an object. So, the investigation of the nature of substance itself became one of the central problems of Western philosophy but it did not arise in Chinese philosophy, because the language is differently constructed.

Zhang’s pluralistic cultural epistemology has no room for truth that transcends all cultures, or for the idea that there is a universal criterion for knowledge, such as the correspondence of a proposition to external objects. Knowledge is always mediated through culture. Knowledge and truth are functions of established criteria within a specific cultural epistemology. Further, there is no way to approach “reality” that is free of the cultural constraints determining what one is looking for, what questions one asks, or what is taken as sufficient evidence for a belief.

3. Moral Theory: Fundamental Questions on Morality

Moral theory and ethics are concerned with questions such as these: How should we live? Is the ultimate purpose of our lives to pursue happiness or pleasure, obey moral rules, please others or higher beings, or follow our own interests? Insofar as the origin of our morality, do we invent morality and agree to it, is it inborn or part of our nature, or is it given by a higher being or intelligence? Is something good or right to do depending on the consequences of the action, our duties, or our passionate feelings? Is morality universal, or relative to its culture or the individual? Are the most basic and important things in morality the actions we do or the sort of persons we are? Many of these questions are addressed directly and indirectly throughout the history of Chinese philosophy.

a. Confucius (551-479 B.C.E.): the Exemplary Person Ideal

The first access that most people have into Chinese philosophy in general, and certainly into the thought of Confucius, is through the Analects (Lunyu). This work is an anthology of selected sayings in which Confucius is often the main teacher. When speaking of morality, the term Confucius uses that is perhaps the closest in meaning is li, often translated as the rites that guide conduct. Li refers to the manner of comporting oneself that helps people transcend animality, develop humaneness (ren), and even exceed present ways of being human by raising themselves to higher expression. This expression is captured by the concept of “exemplary person” (junzi).

In the Analects, the humane (ren) person is able to endure hardship and enjoy happy circumstances (4.2), identify good and evil (4.3), and be free from the desire to do wrong (4.4). Being ren comes through self-cultivation and observing li, and it cannot be reduced to the dichotomy often found in Western moral theory between action (doing) and character (being). Confucius recognizes the importance of both what persons do and the sort of person one is. A person of ren character will act in a certain way; the construction of this character cannot occur without doing the li acts derived from and embodied in the lives of persons who have gone before as our exemplars (junzi). Making oneself into such a person is the work of self-cultivation.

There is no single word in the Analects for self-cultivation; but as a concept Confucius teaches, its imprint is present in the earliest stratum of his teachings. In thinking of the dedication and commitment needed for cultivating oneself, Confucius calls on his disciples to give their utmost (zhong) (3.19). Self-cultivation is not simply learning from books; it includes character development, enhancing talents, and refining (wen) one’s humanity itself (5.15). Cultivating oneself into an exemplary person is never merely reduced to one’s moral actions or values. Confucius recognized that in the activity of self-cultivation everyone makes mistakes, but he taught that it is tragic to repeat a mistake or fail to reform after making one (9.25). Confucius thinks of human being development as taking a raw piece of jade and carving and polishing it until it is fully refined (9.13).

Six of Book 4’s analects specifically describe the exemplary person. Such a person always does what is appropriate (yi) (4.10, 16), cherishes moral excellence (de) (4.11), and is not driven by desires (4.10). Exemplary persons take the high road, not the low one (14.23), and they feel ashamed if their high-sounding words are not fully reflected in their deeds (14.27). Indeed, exemplary persons cherish their excellence of character over power, land, or thought of gain. Exemplary persons take as much trouble discovering what is right as lesser men take to learn what will pay (4.16).

Confucius’s teachings on the exemplary person and self-cultivation are the touchstone for the moral and human ideals of Chinese culture down to the present day.

b. Mohist Moral Philosophy

The doctrine of “Inclusive Concern” (jian ai) is the best known of all Mohist teachings. Mozi took the position that in order to achieve social order people must be concerned for each other, showing care for others and not merely for themselves or their own families. This position was used by the later Mohists to criticize what they took to be the Confucian view; namely, that one has moral responsibilities and duties only to those to whom one is related (that is, the Five Relationships of Confucianism—ruler/subject; parent/child; spouse/spouse; elder sibling/younger sibling; and friend/friend). Practically speaking, jian ai meant that in relationships with others, people should seek mutual benefit and express mutual respect.

Mozi understood the chief problem of humanity in its “state of nature” to have been a world of plural moralities and competing values that eventuated in disorder, selfishness, and evil. So, he argued that a coherent social order must rest on a common and coherent morality that is absolutely and universally true. He held that if pluralism of moral values is allowed to exist, conflict would be the inescapable result. Accordingly, two preeminent philosophical questions occupied Mozi. What is the source of true morality? What is the content of true morality?

Mozi praises Heaven (tian) as impartial, generous, wise, just and caring, and regards it as the source for true morality. Heaven cares for humans and benefits the worthy by providing resources and blessings, while judging and punishing the wicked. Heaven has a dao that orders all things, including its relations with humanity.

Mozi finds the reliance on elitist consensus as the source for morality, which he associates with Confucius and the ideal of the exemplary person (junzi), to be both unconvincing and flawed. He takes the view that even if a practice is traditional (for example, received rites such as li) it is not necessarily morally right. He makes a distinction between custom and morality, associating the Confucian li with custom, while advocating objective moral standards coming from Heaven that he calls fa. For such moral norms, the analogy Mozi uses most often is the plumb line or the L-square. He points out that the function of these tools is to guide the performance of work. They are reliable, objective, and even the novice can employ them. The function of Heaven’s standards is to provide an absolute and universal guide for human life.

As for how we know the content of the Heaven’s true morality, it is mediated through the ruler to the layers of hierarchy down to the people. Specifically, Mozi argues that in human society prototypes, exemplars, and role models that exhibit correct judgments and true morality do so because they are following the will of Heaven or the standards (fa) specified by the Son of Heaven (ruler) who perceives and understands the divine source of morality. While following these standards will yield the best and most efficacious results, Mozi is not strictly a utilitarian. He does not say that examining or quantifying the desirable consequences of an action determines moral right or good. Good outcomes result from following Heaven’s Way and represent confirmation that the standard is from Heaven, but the consequences themselves are not the source of morality’s content.

c. Lao-Zhuang Traditions and wuwei

The Daodejing teaches that when individuals try to make something happen in the world by their own reasoning, plans, and contrivances, they inevitably make a mess of it. But if they take their hands off the course of their lives and move with the dao, then it will untangle all life’s knots, blunt its sharp edges, and soften its harsh glare (DDJ 56). This is relevant to an understanding of Lao-Zhuang teachings on morality because moral distinctions are regarded in this tradition as the kind of tampering and “trying to make something happen” that is warned against.

In Chapter 18 of the Daodejing, the ancient masters have transmitted the teaching that it was only when persons abandoned oneness with dao that they begin to make distinctions in morality. The Daodejing makes this point by specifically mentioning in a critical manner several of the distinctions made in Confucian moral and social philosophy: humaneness (ren); appropriateness (yi); filiality (xiao); and kindness (ci) (DDJ 18). If humans had continued in their primal oneness with dao, they would not have needed to invent such moral discriminations. So, in the Lao-Zhuang traditions there is a call to return to human inner nature that moves with the dao and away from the conventions of morality.

In the Zhuangzi, making distinctions of these sorts is considered a disease that is condemned in several logia of the text (ZZ chs. 2, 5). In the Lao-Zhuang traditions, struggling over these human-made distinctions represents the source of all strife in the world. The key is not to begin this process at all or to empty oneself of it by forgetting such distinctions and returning to the unity with dao, expressing its power (de).

For both the Daodejing and Zhuangzi, the concept wuwei is used to report a kind of effortless, spontaneous conduct that invariably expresses moral efficacy without deliberation or calculating consequences. This is not an ability that is available to persons without preparation. A person caught up in making moral distinctions should not expect to be able to wuwei (as a verb) without first entering into oneness with dao by forgetting those very distinctions. As the Daodejing says, “The [persons who possess the] highest de (virtuous power) do not strive for it and so they have it (DDJ ch. 38).

The holiness of wuwei conduct rests on the fact that moving in this manner accords in the situation with an efficacy that can only be attributed to the dao; it could never have resulted from human wisdom, planning, or contrivance. This is not to say that such action might not correspond to conventional human moral belief. Rather, the point is this: While moving in wuwei may look to the outside observer like moral conduct following human distinctions, its origin lies in empty stillness. It is a hopeless pursuit to invert this process and think that by following human morality one will come upon the dao or be able to wuwei.

The Zhuangzi compares the spontaneous and effortless action of wuwei to the kind of prehension Cook Ding experiences when he cuts up an ox without ever hitting a bone or dulling his knife (ZZ ch. 3). Zhuangzi’s disciples also gathered several stories about conduct analogous to wuwei. For example, stories of extraordinary swimmers and divers; the ferryman in the gulf of Shangshen who handled his boat with commensurate skill; the amazing cicada-catching hunchback; Ji Shengzi, the game cock trainer for King Xuan; Bohun Wuren’s skill in archery; Qing, who makes bell stands that seem to be the work of the spirits; and Chui, the artist who can draw free-hand as true as a compass or T-square (ZZ ch. 19).

d. Mencius (c. 372–289 B.C.E.): Morality as Cultivated Human Nature

The Mencius text records Mencius’s position that humans are distinct from other sentient creatures in having a “moral lens” made up of four propensities (siduan). Another way of saying this is that humans moralize in a way analogous to how that a corn kernel yields corn and not tomatoes. Mencius means that humans do not start out as blank slates having to learn to moralize. All humans must learn specific moralities, but they are enabled, and even inclined, to do so because of the four propensities that he calls “seeds”. For Mencius, humans are good by nature. This view marks the beginning of his philosophy of anthropology.

When reading Mencius, the early Chinese ontology that he inherited must be kept in mind. For him, there is no object that is a self or soul as found in Western philosophy. There is no identifiable “humanness” that sets humans apart from animals. Nevertheless, there is a sort of five-phase correlation of qi that has produced a human rather than something else. The four propensities are part of this structure, and they may be stated as follows: One whose heart-mind (xin) is devoid of compassion, shame, courtesy and modesty, and moral discretion is not human (Mencius 2A6).

The fact that Mencius chooses agriculture metaphors when writing about human nature suggests he is being consistent with the early Chinese ontology that influenced him. The Chinese graph for nature (xing) is related to a word meaning “to be born” or “to live/grow” (sheng). Thus, “nature” can refer to the defining characteristics of a thing, but it can also refer to the characteristics of a thing that will develop over the course of time if given a healthy environment.

Chinese philosophy does not insist on a thick understanding of essentialism. Yet, this does not mean that people are born without generally defining propensities. There are inborn, transitive, generational patterns that create bodies. To be devoid of these or possess some other set might eventuate in some other creature, but not a human body. Likewise, for Mencius, anyone devoid of the four propensities of morality lacks a human nature (xing) and cannot become human.

Mencius’s position cannot be falsified by human wrongdoing. He does not mean that humans are innately programmed to be morally good, or that they will automatically grow into morally good beings. The kernel will produce corn, but not if it is deprived of cultivation. Likewise, human nature is predisposed by means of inborn tendencies to act morally, but being morally good is not automatic.

Evil and violent times can retard the youth, just as drought can harm the crops (6A7; 6A9). The great and luxuriant trees of Ox Mountain are beautiful, but if constantly lopped by axes, we cannot be surprised if the mountain appears bald and ugly. The same is true of a person who repeatedly cuts down the sprouts of his moral intuitions and follows a way of immorality (6A8). On the other hand, Mencius thought that the incipient seeds of morality would grow, with cultivation by li, into the humane person (ren).

The cultivation of these seeds enables a person to increase in humaneness (ren) just as a fire that continually builds or a spring that has begun to vent will flow ever more strongly (6A6). Mencius believes a person can, by virtue of cultivating his inborn moral endowments, find a special kind of energy that he calls “flood-like energy” (haoran zhi qi), which brings both delight over one’s decisions and power to continue performing virtue. In taking this approach, Mencius is making the difference between his position and that of Mozi very clear.

e. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): On the Carving and Polishing of the Human Being

Unlike Mencius, Xunzi believes that human nature is disposed to self-interest and that, left alone without moral guidance and the restrictions of law, self-interest will degenerate into selfishness and breed disorder and chaos. Goodness will not grow from within like corn stalks from kernels because human inclinations are not the four propensities Mencius identified, but desires for beautiful sights and sounds, comfort and power. Unless controlled, these and other desires become violence, willful violation of others, and destruction.

Xunzi says that the sage-kings established moral rites, such as discriminations of right and wrong, and li, to shape, guide, and control people. For Xunzi, human beings invented morality; they did not discover it within Heaven (Mencius) or have it disclosed to them by Heaven (Mozi). Accordingly, if the sage-kings had not invented the rites, there would have been no civilization and no order. Subsequent generations must be transformed by the influence of teachers and models, and follow especially the guidance of morality and rituals of human conduct (li) handed down to them.

Humans depend on the rites of morality created over generations by exemplary humans to shape and carve individual being into something worthwhile. A way of extending the importance of this difference between Mencius and Xunzi is to notice the shift in metaphors that Xunzi makes. Where Mencius used agricultural metaphors, Xunzi employed craft analogies: woodworking, jade carving, home construction, and so forth. For Xunzi, humans by nature are like warped pieces of wood that must be steamed, put into a press, and forced to bend into a straight shape.

He holds that even children must be taught to love their parents and be filial, a position contrary to that of Mencius, who thinks this is a natural inclination. Xunzi believed that if Mencius was correct and human nature was such as to move persons toward the good like water flowing downhill, then there would be no necessity for the emergence of morality or li (Xunzi; Watson 1963: 253).

In Chapter 17 of the Xunzi, Xunzi makes the point that Heaven does not care about human behavior, or how the course of things affects humans. In this, he takes a view much different than that of Mozi. Heaven cannot be appeased or persuaded to bring humans good fortune. If there is good fortune for humans, it is because persons make it happen through responsible government and well-ordered society. Neither does Heaven make people poor or bring calamities. Heaven has no will and no mind, and thus does not act to bring judgment or reward. The well being of persons and societies is squarely in the hands of humans acting morally. All are contrary to Mozi’s view.

f. Buddhist Moralities in the Chinese Context

i. The Way of Precepts

In Chinese Buddhism, the moral life is understood in a way similar to the epistemological one. There are multiple levels. On the lowest level, that of the lay followers, Buddhist morality looks in many ways like a conventional moral system. Various Buddhist schools share the basic code of ethics called the Five Precepts for the guidance of life when a seeker is at this lowest level. These entail abstinence from (1) killing, (2) stealing, (3) sexual misconduct, (4) lying, and (5) intoxication. Some Buddhist schools add three or five precepts to these. The so-called Ten Precepts form the conduct guides for monastic orders. The best-known companion concept to Buddhist morality at the level of precepts is the concept of karma. Karma may be regarded in its most basic sense as the product of one’s past actions. These products may be behavioral consequences, mental conditions or physical states that result from one’s acts.

Individuals living by moral precepts may stand out among others as good and ethical. They may receive awards and recognitions. We may seek them out in our relationships. In its highest forms, this is the Buddhism of compassion for the world, which seeks to remove evil and suffering by living a pure life and contributing to the welfare of others.

However, while such persons are still thinking of life and existence under moral precepts, they remain “in training” and in bondage to volition, names and forms of discrimination that persons use, and desire and suffering; even the desire to be good may cause suffering. They are also still subject to mental anguish and physical attunement.

A higher level of morality than that of following precepts is possible, even as a result of following those precepts. However, a crucial difference occurs when the training eventuates in enlightenment. In nirvana’s extinguishment of desire and vanishing of suffering, all moral precepts may be dispensed with as well. One who has climbed to the heights no longer needs the ladder. Since one is emptied of the attachments and desires moral precepts are meant to control and erase, there is no longer any need for them, nor any function for them once the job is done and desire is extinguished. Such an enlightened one transcends ethics and precepts, and is set free from morality.

ii. The Hua-yan (Flower Garland) Bodhisattva

Hua-yan (Flower Garland) Buddhism valorizes the form of existence known as Bodhisattva. To be a Bodhisattva is to dwell in the margins between experienced enlightenment and surrounding moral and karmic views. The Bodhisattva has already abandoned desires and the discriminations of the mundane world that are the cause of suffering. Accordingly, such the Bodhisattva dwells in this world with a mind that transcends that which causes suffering and has no attachment to the self. Those still caught in this world are attached to the self and to the discriminations of existence, and they suffer because of the desires such attachment creates. When a Bodhisattva lives among such people, the difference is obvious and the other sentient beings see that the Bodhisattva does not suffer. Thereby, the Bodhisattva becomes a savior.

iii. The Way to Morality in Chan Buddhism

Better known in the West by its Japanese equivalent, Zen, chan comes from the Sanskrit term dhyana, which means “meditation.” Although meditation is not the only practice employed in Chan Buddhism, its central role in ethics is important. In Chan Buddhism, the task is not to use reason or a calculus of consequences of actions in order to arrive at knowledge of one’s duties, but rather a person readies himself to act morally through meditation. This state is empty of content such as rules and duties. Indeed, one who practices this as a component of ethics does not say that he “knows” what to do or what is right. Rather, one has set aside the need to speak of the ethical life as connected to moral knowledge. In this state, persons have no need to draw their bearings from culture, community, or any sacred book. For such persons, meditation is the key. It is a sort of alternate consciousness that will enable one to act spontaneously, without calculation or feelings of resistance from the will. Similarities between Chan Buddhism and the concept of wuwei in Lao-Zhuang provide the backdrop for many historical instances of contact and exchange between the traditions.

g. Zhu Xi: Fashioning the Human Being

Whereas Western philosophers often engage in a discussion of the ultimate meaning or goal of human life, frequently associating it with happiness, Zhu Xi identifies the fundamental purpose of human life and its moral objective as equilibrium and harmony (zhonghe). For Zhu Xi, when humans realize equilibrium and harmony to the highest degree, heaven and earth will attain their proper order and all things will flourish. Accordingly, the purpose of morality is self-mastery by yielding to the Principle(s) (li) underlying reality. It is never merely self-realization. Rather, the person of ren (humaneness) “forms one body” with all things. Those who make a cleavage between objects and distinguish between the self and others are petty persons; that is, xiao ren.

Zhu’s ontology is closely connected with his approach to morality. Rather than taking the view that human nature is good or evil, his position is that owing to the way the five phasal elements come together to shape humans, one will be enabled to express the principles and patterns of Heaven. That is, one will be a sage or an evil person, mentally deranged, or a genius (Conversations 4.13, 15). Zhu thinks that he has thereby resolved the philosophical debate between Mencius and Xunzi.

Harmony for Zhu Xi is not so much “knowing yourself,” as Socrates would have it, nor is it identical with Aristotle’s eudaimonia (human flourishing). However, Zhu may well have taken the position that he (harmony) is necessary to both the Socratic and Aristotelian project. Yet, we may wonder whether harmony is a sufficiently robust and satisfying moral ultimate for human life. The question, then, is whether this calls us to the highest levels of achievement as humans.

h. Wang Yangming: Moral Willing as Knowing

While Wang Yangming was critical of Zhu Xi’s thought, he was influenced by the Neo-Confucian thinkers who went before him. Wang adopted their vision that the great man can regard Heaven, earth, and the myriad things as one body, holding that one does so not because he rationally decides to, but because it is natural to his heart-mind (xin)

In contrast to Zhu’s stance of “forming one body” with all things, Wang holds that the “great person” moves by pure intelligence (liangzhi). There is a direct awareness of being one with those in need and acting on that awareness. For Wang, “awareness” is not simply “feeling” or “reason,” which form the usual extremes in Western thought. Rather, feeling and reason are combined as in the Chinese notion of “heart-mind” (xin). This meaning of awareness gives the agent a unifying perspective for experiencing and dealing with all persons, things, and events.

Wang thinks that the direct awareness of Heavenly Principle(s) (tianli) as a moral guide is discovered not by following a moral exemplar, obeying a divine command, or by utilitarian quantification of what action will yield the greatest happiness for the greatest number. Neither does it come into view at the end of a rational process of solving a dilemma one might face. Rather, awareness of tianli is discovered by introspection.

For Wang, the experience of moral enlightenment in liangzhi transforms desire and affections so that individuals freely act. By acting freely, the Way is known. This is the crucial point. Wang is not saying that people who know what is the right thing to do must use their will to redirect their desires and passions in acting upon this knowledge. Rather, he is saying that the transformation of the will is knowledge of the good (Instructions for Practical Living sec. 5).

Yet, we may ask how to distinguish choice through liangzhi from simply “doing what one wants to do” or what “one’s conscience tells one to do”. Wang anticipates this criticism by insisting that, while liangzhi is inherent in all persons, it is the distinguishing characteristic of the mind of the sage. As one prepared by study and deep reflection, the sage’s grasp and awareness of liangzhi is beyond the ordinary. So, one who does not practice like a sage cannot hope to experience his or her own internal powers of liangzhi.

i. Mou Zongsan (1909-1995): Moral Metaphysics

Mou Zongsan coined the term “moral metaphysics” and understood this activity to be primarily occupied with the most basic existential inquires of humans, such as “What should I do?” and “What makes my life meaningful?” Mou argued that in doing moral metaphysics one must notice a two-directional movement between the human and Heaven. He thus used the concept to focus on the transcendent sources of morality. Mou borrowed the philosophical framework of German philosopher Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), but offered his reading of the Neo-Confucians as a corrective to points he believed Kant had gotten wrong.

He understood Kant’s view to be that morality was a priori. In the Groundwork on the Metaphysics of Morals (1785) and The Critique of Practical Reason (1788) Kant developed a method for identifying the pure moral duties of humans by subjecting any candidate’s duty to what he called the Categorical Imperative: “act always on the maxim which you can will to be universal law.”

For Mou, the Neo-Confucian understanding of equilibrium (zhong 中) in the heart-mind (xin) of every person, where the Principle(s) of Heaven were known immediately, was to be preferred to Kant’s Categorical Imperative.

Mou realized that his position required one to commit to a metaphysics (ontology) in a way that Kant’s did not. This is one of the reasons he inverted Kant’s way of speaking about “the metaphysics of morals,” by which Kant meant to identify the presuppositions for morality as we have them.

According to Mou, the Principle(s) of morality could be apprehended by a direct, immediate awareness of the heart-mind, not by the use of Practical Reason as Kant argued. Moreover, he held that creative free action is a manifest reality in the lives of the sages, not merely a postulate of pure practical (moral) reason as Kant held (Mou 1968: 10-13; 43-5). Mou argued that the sages had also connected the finite (what Kant called the phenomenal world) with the infinite (the Principle(s) or what Kant called the noumenal world).

In Kant, the highest good is when happiness occurs in exact proportion to virtue. But Kant said the confluence of optimal virtue and happiness does not and cannot occur in this world. So, morality requires that we postulate both an immortal soul and a God who is able to bring virtue and happiness together. Mou objected to this analysis in Kant, because he thought that personalizing the process that brings virtue and happiness together only pushed the problem to another level. Mou did not see how postulating God provides assurance that virtue and happiness would coincide. How would we know that God would wish to bring virtue and happiness together? Mou preferred another resolution; he held that the concrete example of the sages proved that Heavenly Principle(s) can be manifested in human practice and need not require postulation of an afterlife. Additionally, he held that the sages had lived lives of happiness and virtue, eliminating the grounds used by Kant to postulate both immortality and God.

4. Political Philosophy: Fundamental Questions on Society and Government

Political philosophy is concerned with questions such as these: Prior to government and law, was humanity’s natural state one of freedom and equality, independence or sociality? Were humans inevitably in conflict or did they live in innocent bliss? Does government arise from a contract between persons, the recognized superiority of some persons to lead, or the decree of a higher power? Do we arrive at human laws by participatory exchange of views, do they derive from the nature of reality, are they codifications of the lives of exemplary persons, or are they decrees of rulers or a divine being? What is the best form of government? What is the purpose of government? Are there checks and balances on governments and rulers? Is revolt against the ruler or government ever justified? What is the proper balance between governmental authority and individual liberty of expression and thought? What is the role and responsibility of government to implement justice? In distributing goods, for example, are there rules of entitlement, fairness, equality of opportunity?

a. Confucius on Rulership and the Nature and Function of Politics

Rulership and governance is a principal theme of the Analects (Books 2, 11, 12). Indeed, several of Confucius’s disciples were apprenticed to him to learn the skills and wisdom necessary to become ministers and rulers. The most fundamental characterization of Confucius’s view of rulership is that he believed in a meritocracy. Rulers should ascend to power based on their merit, not their heredity or as a result of having won an election. Confucius’s meritocratic theory is not necessarily anti-democratic, but neither does it elevate democratic process above the higher value of the ruler’s character. Further, there is much in the Analects that suggests Confucius believed that common persons of his day were not prepared or able to participate in government.

Rulers should be exemplary persons, and those who possess virtue (de) will have no difficulty with their people or their kingdom. The classical Confucian ideal is expressed as “nei sheng wai wang” (“internally a sage, externally a ruler”). In an exchange with Ji Kangzi, Confucius says that the ruler who is an exemplary person can affect the entire kingdom with appropriateness (yi) and moral excellence (de), like the wind that blows over the grass (12.19).

Confucius recognizes the need for civil law to extend beyond the rites of propriety and morality (li). However, he also believes that leading the people by political measures and keeping them in place by civil law cannot ensure that the people will develop a sense of shame. Therefore, the measures and law are not sufficient to guarantee order. In contrast to such a style of rulership, a lord who can lead the people by means of his own virtuous power (de) will create a citizenry of honor and virtue. Most importantly, the lord’s governance will create trust (xin) between him and the people.

One of the classical “five relationships” of Confucianism is the relationship between rulers and the people being analogous to a family dynamic. The exemplary ruler will treat the people as though they are his children. Such filial conduct coming from the ruler will create among the people a sense of trust in the king and ministers. Confucius employs the concept of trust instead of “contract” or “agreement” concepts that have been the bedrock of Western political models since the 18^th century.

Confucius did not believe that any given ruler had a “divine right” to be king. Rather, he held that the ruler that shows evidence of proper conduct––namely, self-cultivation and implementing corrections to real or potential harms to the people––would earn him the right to rule. As a result the ruler would win the peoples’ respect and loyalty. “If proper in their own conduct, what difficulty would they have in governing? But if not able to be proper in their own conduct, how can they demand such conduct from others?” (Analects 13.13)

In contrast with minimal intrusion and maximal liberty that characterize Western civil libertarian models, a properly governed state is a value-laden one that produces an environment in which each person may achieve self-cultivation. When listing the tasks of government in order of importance, Confucius names cultivating the trust of the people first, then provision of food, and lastly security and defense (12.7). Western civil libertarian systems, for all their strengths and values, are not necessarily committed to the goal of creating an environment for self-cultivation. They may maximize liberty, but increased freedom does not equate to self-cultivation. For Confucius, politics is rectification or correction (zheng zhe, zheng ye) (12.17). The purpose of politics is to correct deficiencies or mistakes that impede the self-cultivation of each person. While taking a vote may resolve a policy question in participatory governments, it does not actually guarantee that the result is right and correct, which is one reason why Confucius looks to the exemplary leader rather than other models such as democracy or parliamentary debate.

While Confucius holds that filial respect should guide citizens’ conduct toward their rulers, he does not advocate blind obedience. Both Confucius and Mencius state that showing remonstrance with rulers is the responsibility of all who want a truly humane society.

b. Political Philosophy in the Mozi

The basic project of the Mohists was to establish a morally founded social order based on the will of Heaven. To do this, Mozi advocates a system of political hierarchy with the ruler at the top. Even so, the will of Heaven remains as the polity’s governing principle rather than the ruler’s will, his own personal gain or a democratic decision. According to Mozi, the function of this principle is to care for the people universally (jian ai) and benefit the people according to their needs.

The reason Mozi insists that government be structured in a hierarchy under Heaven’s instruction is his view of what Western philosophy has called “the state of nature;” a time before the existence of government. Mozi holds that in that state, there existed a multiplicity of moralities and values. Such pluralism and relativism did not lead to a social contract; rather, it turned people against each other. Only a true and absolute moral system given by Heaven can overcome such relativism and its resulting conflict.

Mozi states that the one who is the most worthy and understands the Way of Heaven (tiandao) is selected by Heaven and established as the Son of Heaven (Mozi 11.2). The worthy ruler is someone who has Heaven’s intention, just like wheelwrights have compasses and carpenters have squares. Wheelwrights and carpenters use their compasses and squares to evaluate circles and squares in the world, claiming that what conforms is right, what does not conform is wrong. The ruler governs by the standards of Heaven. The result is that unity of the people under a set of laws or principles does not come by mutual agreement but by the silencing of divergent points of view under a ruler who enacts the will of Heaven.

What is interesting about Mozi’s theory is that the common people should not only exhibit strict obedience to the rulers, but they should emulate them in their behavior. This is called “exalting worthiness,” and it represents Mozi’s view on the strength and purpose of a political community (Mozi 8.7). He argues for a strong version of political authoritarianism; a centralized state with a hierarchical, tightly organized bureaucracy. This structure, properly conceived of, will lead to the benefit of the people.

c. Mencius’s Political Philosophy

Mencius’s political philosophy is often neglected in a study of Chinese thought. Unlike Mozi, who explored the origin of government and offered a kind of “state of nature” argument for its emergence, Mencius does not speculate about the circumstances that gave rise to government. Instead, he is interested in providing a robust constructivist philosophical ideology called “benevolent government” (renzheng).

Mencius was well-placed to write such a theory. He was a shi, or scholar who traveled from state to state, seeking to be a ruler’s political advisor or military strategist. These traveling advisors often had a significant influence on the ruler, and some of them even became powerful high-ranking officials.

For Mencius, a ruler who practices benevolent governance should do at least the following things: reduce punishment and taxation (1A5), rejoice with his people (1B1), make sure that the masses are neither cold nor hungry (1A7), take no pleasure in executions or war (1A6), let no one starve to death (1A4), and take care of four types of people who are the most needy; widows, widowers, old people without children, and young children without fathers (1B5). In giving advice to King Xuan, Mencius makes clear that he is following Confucius in holding that the state should be ruled by the virtuous, not by those who are elected by the people or inherit rulership by family lineage.

Mencius thinks it is the obligation of government to ensure that the basic needs of the people are met. Today this would be called the provision of social goods or secondary goods, in contrast to the primary goods of liberty and freedom. He is not intent on teaching that the role of government is to maximize civil liberty. He provides specific advice about how the state should help secure the livelihood of the people, including recommendations about everything from tax rates, to farm management, to the pay scale for government employees (3A3). Mencius also agrees with Confucius that self-cultivation is crucial both for the individual and for society. So he advocates an educational system in the ideal state that would instruct people how to be responsible in their relationships as parent, child, ruler, minister, spouse, and friend (3A4).

According to the Mengzi text, Mencius touches upon the removal of the ruler on several occasions. He says that ministers, but not the common people, should not hesitate to depose a ruler who repeatedly refuses to listen to admonitions against serious mistakes (5B9). Speaking of historical instances in which rulers were removed, Mencius says that a sovereign who mutilates benevolence (ren) or cripples rightness (yi) is an outcast, even if he is an emperor (1B8). If the king is not humane, and if he abuses the people instead of taking care of their welfare, he can be legitimately deposed.

d. Lao-Zhuang and Yellow Emperor Traditions on Rulership and Government

The logia of the Daodejing make it clear that reality left alone moves as it should, and that it is human tampering with relationships and attempts to guide and orchestrate things that make a mess of life. Morality and law are evidences of such tampering. “Only when the great Way (Dao) is abandoned, do morals and laws of benevolence and righteousness arise” (DDJ 18). “The more taboos and prohibitions there are in the world, the poorer the people… The more laws and edicts, the more there will be thieves and robbers.” (DDJ 5). Ideally, the follower of the dao will not engage in rulership or political machination at all because there will be no need to do so. In fact, human efforts to manage life through law, morality, and governmental policy only make matters worse (DDJ 29). In this connection, the text is famous for its aphorism that ruling a state is like cooking a small fish (DDJ 60), the point of which is that the least amount of tampering is best, as though the ruler should allow the Dao to take its course without manipulation by government.

There is no question that the Lao-Zhuang philosophical tradition wanted to reduce governmental control. “The more dull and passive the government, the more honest and agreeable the people. The more active and [interventionist] the government, the more deformed and deficient the people’s lives will be” (DDJ 60). Rulers should be well within the background and not seek a name for themselves. “The greatest of rulers is but a shadowy presence; next is the ruler who is loved and praised; next is the one who is feared; next is the one who is reviled” (DDJ 17).

Chapters 1-7 of the Zhuangzi tend to continue these same emphases from the Daodejing, calling governing by law and structure “a bogus virtue,” as futile as drilling into a river (ZZ Ch. 7). These chapters make it clear that Daoist masters did not seek, and even actively avoided, positions as officials or rulers. Chapter 28 contains a long series of text logia all dealing with rulership, designed to show that when they were approached with the offer of political employment, famous Daoist masters refused it, fled into far regions, or even attempted suicide.

However, in the Zhuangzi’s Yellow Emperor-Laozi Daoist (Huang-lao) lineage materials (ZZ Ch. 11-16; 18-19) a different view of rulership is expressed. These sections do not recommend turning away from political involvement. Instead, they say that in the early period of his rule the Yellow Emperor used the Confucian virtues of benevolence (ren) and righteousness (yi) to meddle with the minds of men. What followed was a history of consternation and confusion, all the way down to the Confucians and Mohists who are mentioned by name. However, the Yellow Emperor then underwent a transformation and learned the “Perfect Dao” on the Mountain of Emptiness and Identity (Kongtong). When he returned to rule and followed wuwei, his kingdom became peaceful, and he became an immortal transcendent (xian) (ZZ Ch. 11). The views of the Yellow Emperor-Laozi tradition are more developed in the important work Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi), edited under Liu An and presented in 139 B.C.E. to the Han imperial court.

e. Legalism and Hanfei (280?-230? B.C.E.)

The term “Legalism” or the “Legalist School” (fa jia) first appeared in Sima Qian’s Records of the Historian circa 90 B.C.E. Traditionally, Guan Zhong (d. 645 B.C.E.?) is called “the father of Legalism”. However, calling “Legalism” a school is somewhat misleading because there was no “school” of this thought per se; it was more of a philosophy of law and its practice. A number of philosophers associated with this approach were active in government as ministers, officials, and imperial consultants. For example, Shang Yang (d. 338 B.C.E.) was a chancellor of the Qin state and Shen Buhai (d. 337 B.C.E.) held a similar position in the Han state. Hanfei (280?-230 B.C.E.) was an advisor in the Han state, just prior to its annexation by Qin in creating China’s first empire in 221 B.C.E. It is generally acknowledged that Qinshihuang (birth name, Ying Zheng, 260-210 B.C.E.), the first emperor of China, as well as advisors such as Li Si (280?-208 B.C.E.) followed Legalist writings in unifying the diverse states of China into an empire. Possibly, they followed a version of the text called Hanfeizi.

Hanfei shared a view of human nature somewhat similar to that of Xunzi. He thought the natural aspirations of the people are such that they all move toward security and benefit. Xunzi held that public-spirited people are few while private-minded individuals are numerous. While this is not a well-developed theory of the “state of nature,” it was adequate to pose the problem faced by explaining where the state comes from and what is its necessity for Hanfei. His recommended solution for “private-mindedness” is the establishment of government.

Still, Hanfei does not mean that human nature is evil. He simply means that humans give primacy to their own self-interest. The carriage maker hopes that men will grow rich and eminent so that he can sell carriages. The coffin maker wants persons to continue to pass away, so that he can stay in business, but not because he is evil or wishing others bad fortune.

Hanfei has a deep appreciation for the power of socio-economic forces on the life of humans and any society they create. He is not a complete economic determinist, but he feels that resources and scarcity play a role in the extent to which one will adhere to social order. In taking this position, Hanfei anchors his political theory on the belief that human action is a by-product of the socio-economic environment in which persons live. So, creating a state in which the resources are sufficient, available to all, and fairly distributed is the single best way to encourage moral goodness, peace, and societal harmony.

This means that if a ruler wants and needs his people to work diligently, he must motivate them by an appeal to their self-interests. Moreover, the skillful ruler should set up policies and administer the state so that an individual’s maximization of his own self-interest will also enlarge the public interest and the state.

Unlike Confucian, Mohist, Mencian, and Lao-Zhuang traditions, an ideal for Hanfei state does not depend on having a virtuous ruler. Even a ruler who is morally deficient in his own personal life may, nevertheless, be a good ruler if he sets up the proper policies and administration by means of five tactics: the use of the power of position; the employment of administrative methods; the making of laws; taking hold of the two handles of government (reward and punishment); and the non-action (wuwei) of the ruler.

Hanfei’s separation of politics from morality is an approach that earlier Chinese philosophers would not have accepted. To put it succinctly, while previous classical Chinese political philosophies insisted on rule by the virtuous (for example, a meritocracy) and a close association between morality and politics, Hanfei sees no difficulty in considering both the ruler and politics as amoral.

f. Political Thought in the Han Dynasty (206 B.C.E.-220 C.E.)

i. Dong Zhongshu (179-104 B.C.E.)

When Han Emperor Wu took control of the state, he consulted scholars and officials to gain advice on how to govern. Dong Zhongshu wrote several documents designed to reform government that used Confucian ideology paired with an ontology of the resonance (ganying) between human action and Heaven’s activity; that is, acting morally good will result in Heaven’s blessing in health, position, and longevity. Dong recommended the establishment of a Grand Academy (taixue) to train those who would serve the government in the skills they would need.

His most important works are contained in the Luxuriant Gems of the Spring and Autumn Annals. Dong continued the emphases of Confucius and Mencius calling for rule by the meritorious and for the establishment of a humane (ren) government. A principal difference between Dong and Confucius and Mencius is that he attached more significance to the role of Heaven in validating policy and social structure as a transcendent power. The ruler and his ministers were subject to the authority of Heaven, and their task was to do good and proper acts, setting up the kind of resulting resonance that would be seen in Heaven’s blessings. Violation of the principles of Heaven would bring disturbances in the natural, human, and spiritual worlds.

Dong built his philosophy on a much heavier reliance on the transcendent than can be seen in Confucius, Mencius, or Xunzi. Rulers must follow the principles of Heaven and fulfill its mandate, or else disaster will follow. He even speaks of Heaven as the “great grandfather” (zeng zufu) of humanity. And yet, following Confucius, Dong insisted that in order to carry out the will of Heaven, a ruler must rely on education and the rites rather than punishment and killing.

Applying the explanatory system of the five elemental phases, Dong wrote that rulers should practice, and the state should inculcate, the five virtues: humaneness (ren), rightness (yi), propriety (li), wisdom (zhi) and loyalty (xin). Dong believed strongly that all political activity should reflect the five phases. To be in accordance with these phases, he even called for a new calendar to be issued, colors of banners to be changed, monuments redesigned, and complete revision of other trappings of government.

ii. Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi 139 B.C.E.)

According to his biography in the Book of the Early Han (Hanshu, 44.2145) Liu An, the king of Huainan (in modern Anhui province) and uncle of Han Emperor Wu, gathered a large number of scholars and practitioners of esoteric techniques to Huainan in the period 160-140 B.C.E., and supported them in the creation of written works synthesizing their views. The Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi) was a product of this interchange of ideas.

It is a work focused on educating a ruler on the tasks before him. In the text we find a theory of the fall of humanity from an original harmony in the state of nature to human government and politics with its attendant disorder and violence. Instead of government resulting from agreement between persons for whom there is no law, where the powerful can enforce their will over the weak, the text takes the reverse approach. The primal state is presented as a natural, spontaneous, and peaceful existence. Government is then the source of humanity’s problems, not a solution.

Chapter nine of the Masters of Huainan (HZ) is entitled “The Ruler’s Techniques,” and its focus is on the methods that a ruler should use to create a humane and orderly government. The first, and certainly the most important technique, for a ruler is to act in wuwei. This does not mean the ruler should do absolutely nothing. It means that when he acts, nothing comes from him personally (HZ 9.23); that is, his policies are neither biased by his private preferences (HZ 9.25), nor are they restricted by the limits of his own vision for the state (HZ 9.9-9.11). Instead, his actions implement the movement of the Way (Dao) of Heaven (HZ 9.2).

The best form of government, the text suggests, is one where the ruler devotes himself to wuwei. Ideal rulers of the distant past such as Fuxi, Nuwa, and the Yellow Emperor (Huangdi) are described as being its adherents (HZ 6.7). By following their spontaneous natures and aligning themselves with profound wuwei, the world naturally became harmonious (HZ 8.5).

g. Zhu Xi on Law as the Enforcement of Morals

Zhu Xi shared Confucius’s distrust for the ability of law alone to bring order in society and to cultivate the people. He recognized that government and law were necessary, but considered them insufficient to bring about social order; virtue and ritual were still important. Virtue, law, rites, and punishments should complement each other. Zhu made an important contribution to Chinese political theory by insisting that governing by virtue and ritual was compatible with a system of laws and punishments, and he argued that Confucius’s protest against reliance on law was motivated by the context in which he lived, when some rulers made no use of virtue or the rites (li) at all.

In fact, Zhu Xi supported the use of law to assist in the moral education of the populace. The purpose of law was not merely to protect those in the society from harm or injury. It was also to shape the character of the society and its people. Accordingly, government not only had the right but also the obligation to engineer the morality of society and control what the people could do morally.

Nevertheless, Zhu Xi was aware of the long history of abuse of the power to make law, grant amnesties, and remit punishment practiced by Song dynastic rulers. He argued that laws must be clear and the enforcement of them must be just. He challenged directly the practice of amnesty (dashe) as frequently degenerating into a form of favoritism and injustice. By insisting on the enforcement of law and punishment of offenders, Zhu is often misunderstood as being akin to the worst abusers of law as found in the Legalist tradition. However, he was not advocating severity of punishment as a value in itself, but rather recommending the just administration of law as the active enforcement of morals, using politics as a means of moral cultivation.

h. Yan Fu (1854-1921): China Not Ready for Democracy

After the first Sino-Japanese War of 1894-1895, China entered into the period that one might call Modern Chinese Philosophy where there was an influx of texts and ideas from the Western world. Yan Fu became the most influential translator of Western works in China. In fact, Yan was not only the greatest authority on Western philosophy in China at the beginning of the 20^th century, but also he was the first scholar to systematically introduce Western philosophy by translating a significant number of works: Thomas Henry Huxley’s Evolution and Ethics (1893), published in Chinese in 1898; Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations (1776), published in Chinese in 1902; Herbert Spencer’s The Study of Sociology (1872) and John Stuart Mill’s On Liberty (1859), both translations published in Chinese in 1904; Charles de la Secondat de Montesquieu’s The Spirit of the Laws (1748), John Stuart Mill’s A System of Logic (1843), translated in 1905, and William Stanley Jevon’s The Theory of Political Economy (1878), translated in 1909.

Yan was a true cultural intermediary who, at a critical moment in history, sought to make European works of philosophy and social science accessible to a Chinese readership. He put forward a form of Social Darwinism according to which social organization is also a product of evolution and subject to its same laws and processes.

He declares that both the Western powers and Japan, which had invaded and exploited China, were nevertheless morally and intellectually “superior.” In his view, China had become “inferior” as a result of its inability to excel in the international competition of worldviews, technology, and socio-political structures. He made his thought clear that in order for China to fare well in global competition with other nations it must alter its societal structure.

Yan claimed that the reason why China was weaker and less able to compete compared to the Western nations was its lack of liberty for its people. Yan not only accepted Mill’s view in On Liberty that the strength of a body politic lies in its commitment to the discovery of truth but he also recognized that liberty of expression and inquiry is essential to pursuit and recognition of truth. Accordingly, he extended the point to claim that liberty is essential in order to produce a strong nation. When people lack liberty, they will not be motivated to fight for the state or work hard in order to create a productive society.

Prior to Yan Fu, the concept of liberty that he was drawing from Mill does not mean doing whatever one wants. Society has genuine interests that might be harmed by indiscriminate freedom of action. Moreover, society has a right to transmit a set of values and cultural practices that can limit freedom of the individual. But Yan cautions that China’s highly structured moral beliefs and social rituals can overwhelm liberty if not properly watched.

To this point, there had not been any rigorous analysis of the nature and place of liberty in Chinese political philosophy. While some philosophical defenses of remonstrance with parents or rulers can be found in the history of Chinese philosophy, the function of this concept is much different than what Mill means by one’s individual free expression of lifestyle. Accordingly, when Chinese intellectuals began reading Mill and Yan’s commentaries on the translation, a new way of looking at society and a person’s place within it came into view.

Yan was forced to defend himself against conservative critics in China who felt the radicalism of a civil libertarian society represented danger and the possibility of chaos. His strategy was to claim that although society should not interfere with individual human liberty, neither should the individual do anything to harm society by his free expression. Accordingly, Yan’s translation of Mill’s work was published under the title, On the Borderline between Society’s and Individuals’ Power. In his comments on the book, Yan extended Mill’s “harm principle,” to include a legitimate political power to restrict freedom in the name of the protection of societal and communal integrity and value.

Nevertheless, Yan did not support China’s 1911 revolution to create a Republic and disestablish the Qing dynasty. Rather, he insisted on gradual political reform. He thought that improved education for the Chinese population was needed before the people would be ready to participate in government; the Chinese people at the turn of the 20^th century, Yan believed, were not yet ready for participatory government and responsible use of free expression.

i. Liang Qichao (1873-1929): Emergent Chinese Nationalism

Xiao Yang (17) calls Liang Qichao “the most widely read public intellectual during the transitional period from the late Qing dynasty (1644-1912) to the Republican era (1912-49)”. For Liang Qichao, the central task of philosophy is to perfect the principles and rules necessary for social affairs within a political system. He thought an authentic philosopher was not so much an ontologist or epistemologist as a jingshi; that is, a statesman or scholar who practices statesmanship.

Liang built his early political philosophy from 1896-1903 on the position that the myriad things of existence move continuously toward integration and grouping (qun). He read Thomas Huxley’s Evolution and Ethics, and he interpreted Huxley’s findings to mean that higher evolutionary development always took place when solidarity and group harmony became overriding intentions, whether in kinship lines, groups, tribes, or emergent human societies. This position led him to distinguish between the moral virtues that related to individual personal conduct (side) and civic or public virtues (gongde), which were necessary for the creation of a healthy and ideal society. Liang proposed to develop a modern Chinese political philosophy designed to produce what he called a “new citizenry” (xinmin) for China.

Liang took the Chinese term min (people), which was used to mark the people that made up a population, and replaced it with the concept guomin (citizens) in an intentional effort to tie individual identity and nationalism together. He believed a philosophically viable political body is not merely made up of a population. The people must be brought into being as citizens who express their powers and right to self-government, otherwise the nation itself ceases to exist and becomes something ultimately destructive to human flourishing.

In his essay, “On the Progress China has made in the Last Fifty Years” (1922), Liang held to two principles. The first, which he called “the spirit of nation building,” was “Anyone who is not Chinese has no right to govern Chinese affairs” (Liang 7). The second, known as “the spirit of democracy,” was “Anyone who is Chinese has the right to govern Chinese affairs” (Liang 4031).

j. Mao Zedong (1893-1976): The Sinification of Marxism

Marxist writings were introduced to China as part of the movement called “Western Learning” (Xi xue). The first reference to Western socialism seems to be in an essay by Yan Fu. However, Zhao Bizhen’s translation of Fukui Junzo’s Modern Socialism in 1903 was the first comprehensive introduction of Marxism into China. In 1912, a Chinese translation of Friedrich Engels’s Socialism: Utopian and Scientific was serialized in issues 1-7 of “The New World” (Xin Shijie). The Chinese version of Karl Marx and Friedrich Engels’ Communist Manifesto (Gongchangdang xuanyan) was translated by Chen Wangdao and published in April 1919. In 1931, Chen Qixiu translated Das Kapital, the fundamental text of Marxist economics.

While many Chinese intellectuals wrote on Marxism in the early part of the 20^th century, no thinker is as important to the sinification of Marxism as Mao Zedong. While some would question Mao’s credentials as a philosopher, he did, however, educate himself extensively on Chinese history and philosophy. His concerns were directed into a relatively narrow range of philosophical inquiry: social, political, and economic thought.

Mao thought that Marxism must be made to engage with the specific and particular situation of the Chinese people and culture. He held that Chinese Communists must learn how to apply the theories of Marxism-Leninism to concrete situations in China, enabling an application of Marxist philosophy that is uniquely Chinese in all circumstances.

Several factors are important to note about how and why Marxism assumed its particular form in China in the 1940s-1970s. Perhaps most important of these is that Chinese Marxism drew on the Chinese intellectual tradition in ways that minimized some of the difficulties that are found in Western Marxism. Long before the introduction of Marxist thought, Chinese philosophical history embraced the principles of the socio-economic significance to communal order, a humanistic non-religious worldview, dialectical social and intellectual processes, and authoritarian rule by an enlightened elite. When Marxism was rendered into the Chinese target language, its central concept of “dialectics” was translated as tongbian or “continuity through change,” a concept used historically in Chinese tradition.

Instead of using yin and yang to translate Marxist “dialectics,” Mao’s uses the terms mao (spear) and dun (shield), employing a famous story taken from the Hanfeizi. In the story a dialectical tension emerges when a man offers to sell both an invincible sword and an impenetrable shield. Mao uses this example to highlight the inevitability of the dynamic interaction of divergent views that contradict each other. For Mao, only actual political practice and societal change, not intellectual cognition or language, can fully overcome the tongbian (dialectics) of Chinese social and economic realities. Dialectics is not an academic exercise, but a revolutionary one.

In what became known as “Mao Zedong Thought,” Mao called for a “New Democracy” where power would be taken from the organizations and persons that had perpetuated China as a semi-colonial and semi-feudal society and given to a new revolutionary leadership of the people who would transform China into a new socialist state. He spoke of this change as a dictatorship of the revolutionary leadership and a democratic centralism. Rather than the product of universal suffrage, by “democratic” he meant “oriented toward the people” (Mao, June 30, 1949 and February 27, 1957).

The “New Democracy” would require a “New Economy” in which the new government would own the banks and industrial and commercial enterprises in order to prevent them from dominating the livelihood of the people (Mao February 27, 1957). Eventually, these political ideas found expression in the “iron rice bowl” (tie fanwan) and state-owned enterprises, as a vision of the ways government should pursue distributive justice.

k. Forms of Contemporary Confucian Political Theory

i. Tu Weiming

One thinker who is contributing to a renewal and revision of political theory by constructing a New Confucian social theory is Tu Weiming. In his Reinventing Confucianism: the New Confucian Movement, Umberto Bresciani names Tu as the leader of the “third generation” of New Confucians. Tu is Professor of Philosophy and founding Dean of the Institute for Advanced Humanistic Studies at Peking University.

Tu considers Confucianism to be an all-embracing humanism that merges the secular and sacred. He also believes that the Confucian moral ideal of the exemplary person can be realized more fully in a liberal democratic society than in either the traditional imperial monarchies or modern authoritarian regimes. Moreover, he argues that Confucianism adapted for the contemporary period is an antidote to the deficiencies of Western philosophy that gives insufficient importance to the idea of community and privileges the political ideals which tend to degenerate into injustice and disorder.

Tu closely associates ethics and politics, and argues that the work of political rectification envisioned by Confucius is one which monitors and constantly adjusts social processes of communal life in order to bring about a “fiduciary community” where each person is not merely permitted, but encouraged, to pursue moral self-cultivation.

Tu suggest that in the Confucian community divergent interests and plural desires are dealt with differently than in social contract and civil libertarian adversarial systems where the tyranny of the majority may be expressed in the ballot. In the fiduciary community, no decision by ruling authority can be regarded as appropriate if it destroys the ethos of trustworthiness among the people or between the people and the government. Such a delimitation of power creates in the community what Tu calls a “convergence of orientations”. The resulting benefit is a fiduciary community where citizens “exhort one another to do good” (bai xing quan) in a learning culture.

While he recognizes the immense value of Western enlightenment rationality, Tu insists that its tools and values must be supplemented by three requirements that can move humanity toward a global ethic: 1) converting from an anthropocentric to an anthropocosmic vision that appreciates the vibrancy of spirituality and removes man from being the measure of all things; 2) revising instrumental rational empiricism to include sympathy and empathy necessary for a full phenomenology of experience; and 3) instantiating the universalizable values of liberty, rationality, law, human rights, and the dignity of the individual.

ii. Jiang Qing

Jiang Qing is a contemporary Chinese Confucian who is best known for his criticism of New Confucianism as expressed by Tu Weiming and others. According to him, New Confucianism deviated from original Confucian principles and is overly influenced by Western liberal democracy. He also feels there is a drift in the Chinese Communist Party that seems unfocused and without direction. He proposes an alternative path for China called “Constitutional Confucianism” or “Political Confucianism.” Jiang believes that China’s ongoing political and social problems are to be solved by the revival of and commitment to what he considers to be authentic Confucianism.

To implement his changes, Jiang argues that Confucian materials should replace the Marxist curriculum taught in China’s universities and government party schools. He has been an advocate for new Confucian academies throughout the country, especially his own retreat called Yangming Spiritual House. He has been a central player in the “Reading of the Classics Movement” (dujing yundong), having edited a 12-volume school textbook titled The Fundamental Texts of Chinese Culture Classics for Reading (2004).

In A Confucian Constitutional Order, Jiang advocates what he calls “Humane Authority” as the guiding value of political process. His new model is expressed through a trilateral parliamentary framework made up of a House of Exemplary Persons that represents the sacred, a House of the Nation that represents historical and cultural legitimacy, and a House of the People that represents popular sentiment.

iii. Kang Xiaoguang

Kang Xiaoguang has taken up the challenge to offer a political philosophy for China’s post-Mao years in several works. An summary of his views in English is by David Ownby (2009). Kang calls for the Chinese Community Party to be Confucianized. He thinks Marxism should be replaced with a reconstituted and adapted philosophical system of Confucius and Mencius. He holds that while the educational system will keep the party schools, their syllabi should be changed, listing the Four Books and Five Classics as required texts. Kang desires a return to the examination system for all promotions in the Chinese bureaucracy and he wants Confucian philosophical teachings to be added to each examination. Moreover, he also maintains that the Chinese society as a whole should be Confucianized. Here the key is to introduce Confucianism into the national education system, adding courses in Chinese culture that Kang claims will impart a value system, a faith, and soul for the culture. In the long term, he thinks that the moral bearings of China can be rebalanced only if Confucianism becomes the state’s civil value system.

iv. Fan Ruiping

Fan Ruiping’s project is set out most clearly in his Reconstructionist Confucianism: Rethinking Morality after the West (2010). In this work, he calls for reclaiming and articulating resources from the Confucian tradition to address contemporary moral and public policy challenges. He sets his effort against both Western civil libertarian democracies and the New Confucianism of Tu Weiming and others. He holds that while Western social philosophy is founded on abstract and general principles, Confucianism is defined by specific rules that identify particular practices leading to a virtuous mode of life developed in the forge of a properly harmonious Confucian family. Fan argues that in such families persons learn how to treat others as unequals and gain mastery of the push and pull of graded love, creating a virtuous familism that is transferable to the society at large. Instead of Western language about rights, Fan holds that the goal in political policy is to treat persons as relatives and the nation and global community as a household drawing on the archetype of a traditional Chinese family that brought many persons into its circle of influence. Rather than norms such as “justice as fairness” (John Rawls), Fan characterizes the Confucian model as “justice as harmony.”

An important source in English for current debates about Confucian reconceptualization of Chinese politics in theory and practice is Fan’s collection of essays entitled The Renaissance of Confucianism in Contemporary China.

5. Epilogue

The history of Chinese philosophy may be approached in many ways. In this article, an overview of many important thinkers has been provided, and their contributions to world philosophy on the topics of ontology, epistemology, moral theory, and political philosophy were discussed. Another viable approach to the history of the tradition would be to demarcate the moves made in Chinese philosophical thought within the flow of Chinese history itself, giving attention also to the interactions between Chinese thinkers and internal dialogues of significance. Both of these approaches can contribute to an appreciation of the significance and value of philosophy and the important place Chinese philosophers play within it.

6. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger. The Art of Rulership: A Study of Ancient Chinese Political Thought. Albany: SUNY Press, 1994.
Angle, Stephen. Contemporary Confucian Political Philosophy: Toward Progressive Confucianism. Malen, MA: Polity Press, 2012.
Bell, Daniel, and Fan Ruiping, eds. A Confucian Constitutional Order: How China’s Ancient Past Can Shape Its Political Future. Princeton: Princeton UP, 2012.
Bernal, Martin. Chinese Socialism to 1907. Ithaca, NY: Cornell UP, 1976.
Bersciani, Umberto. Reinventing Confucianism: The New Confucian Movement. Taipei: Taipei Ricci Institute for Chinese Studies, 2001.
Bishop, Donald, ed. Chinese Thought: An Introduction. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1985.
Blakeley, Donald. “The Lure of the Transcendent in Zhu Xi.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 21.3 (2004): 223-40.
Briere, O. Fifty Years of Chinese Philosophy: 1848-1948. Trans. Lawrence Thompson. New York: Praeger, 1965.
Bruce, Percy. Chu Hsi and His Masters: An Introduction to Chu Hsi and the Sung School of Chinese Philosophy. London: Probsthain & Co., 1923.
Carr, Karen, and Philip J. Ivanhoe. The Sense of Antirationalism: The Religious Thought of Zhuangzi and Kierkegaard. New York: Seven Bridges, 2000.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. A Sourcebook in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1963.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. Instructions for Practical Living and Other Neo-Confucian Writings by Wang Yang-Ming. New York: Columbia UP, 1963.
Chang, Carsun. The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought. 2 vols. New York: Bookman Associates, 1957-1962.
Chin, Ann-ping, and Mansfield Freeman. Tai Cheng on Mencius: Explorations in Words and Meaning. New Haven: Yale UP, 1990.
Ching, Julia. To Acquire Wisdom: The Way of Wang Yang-ming. New York: Columbia UP, 1976.
Chou, Chih-P’ing, ed. Collection of Hu Shih’s English Writings. 3 vols. Heidelberg: Foreign Language Teaching and Research Publishing Co., 1995.
Chung-ying, Cheng, and Nicholas Bunnin eds. Contemporary Chinese Philosophy. Malden, MA: Blackwell, 2002.
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Author Information

Ronnie Littlejohn
Email: ronnie.littlejohn@belmont.edu
Belmont University
U. S. A.

Margaret Cavendish (1623—1673)

Margaret Lucas Cavendish, the Duchess of Newcastle, was a philosopher, poet, playwright and essayist. Her philosophical writings were concerned mostly with issues of metaphysics and natural philosophy, but also extended to social and political concerns. Like Hobbes and Descartes, she rejected what she took to be the occult explanations of the Scholastics. Against Descartes, however, she rejected dualism and incorporeal substance of any kind. Against Hobbes, on the other hand, she argued for a vitalist materialism, according to which all things in nature were composed of self-moving, animate matter. Specifically, she argued that the variety and orderliness of natural phenomena cannot be explained by blind mechanism and atomism, but instead require the parts of nature to move themselves in regular ways, according to their distinctive motions. And in order to explain that, she argued for panpsychism, the view that all things in nature possess minds or mental properties. Indeed, she even argued that all bodies, including tables and chairs, as well as parts of the bodies of organisms, such as the human heart or liver, know their own distinctive motions and are thereby able to carry it out. These different parts of nature, each knowing and executing their distinctive motions, create and explain the harmonious and varied order of it. In several ways, Cavendish can be seen as one of the first philosophers to take up several interesting positions against the mechanism of the modern scientific worldview of her time. Thus it is possible to add that she presages thinkers such as Spinoza and Leibniz.

When she turned to discuss political and social issues, Cavendish’s metaphysical commitments seem to remain. Cavendish was a staunch royalist and aristocrat; perhaps not surprisingly, then, she argued that each person in society has a particular place and distinctive activity and that, furthermore, social harmony only arises when people know their proper places and perform their defining actions. She was therefore critical of social mobility and unfettered political liberty, seeing them as a threat to the order and harmony of the state. Even so, her writings also contain nuanced and complex discussions of gender and religion, among a variety of other topics.

Despite her conservative political tendencies, Cavendish herself can be seen as a model for later women writers. She wrote dozens of books, at least five of which alone were on natural philosophy, under her own name, a feat which may make her the most published female author of the seventeenth century and one of the most prolific women philosophers in the early modern period. In addition to writing much on natural philosophy, she wrote on a dizzying array of other topics and, perhaps most impressively, in a wide range of genres. Her philosophically informed poetry, plays, letters and essays are at times as philosophically valuable as her treatises of natural philosophy.

Life and Works
Natural Philosophy
Political Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Margaret Lucas was born in 1623 in Colchester into a family of aristocrats and staunch royalists. She received little formal education, being tutored at home with her seven siblings, of which she was the youngest. She reports having spent much time in conversation with one of her brothers, John, who considered himself a scholar and who would become a founding member of the Royal Society. She joined the Queen’s court and served as a maid to Queen Henrietta Maria, following her into exile in 1644, during the English Civil War. While in exile she met William Cavendish, then Marquess and later Duke of Newcastle. They were married in 1645.

While in exile in Paris and Antwerp, she reports discussing philosophy and natural science with her husband and his younger brother, Sir Charles Cavendish, who held a regular salon attended by Thomas Hobbes, Kenelm Digby and occasionally René Descartes, Marin Mersenne and Pierre Gassendi. Margaret herself reports having attended several dinners, at which these philosophers were present, though she denies having spoken to them about any, but the most superficial of matters.

While her husband remained in exile, she returned in 1651 and again in 1653 to England. This was during the reign of Commonwealth, during which her husband, were he to have returned, would have had to renounce his royalism and swear fealty to the Commonwealth, as was required by the republican parliament of the time. The parliament did not extend that requirement to women, claiming that women were not capable of such political acts. Thus Margaret was allowed to return to England without swearing fealty to the Commonwealth.

During her 1653 visit, she arranged for the publication of her first collection of writings, Poems and Fancies and Philosophical Fancies. She reports having delivered the second philosophical treatise a few days too late to have it included with the first in a single publication, which had been her original intention. The publisher was Martin and Allestyre, at the Bell in St. Paul’s Churchyard, which was a well-regarded publisher, who later became the official publisher for the Royal Society. It is truly remarkable that she was able to secure their publication, as few women published philosophy in England in the seventeenth century, much less under their own name and while in exile.

The same publishing house would publish The World’s Olio and Philosophical and Physical Opinions in 1655 and Nature’s Pictures in 1656. The second work of 1655, Philosophical and Physical Opinions, contained five parts and 210 chapters, the first part of which, consisting of 58 chapters, was in fact a reprinting of her earlier Philosophical Fancies. With her 1655 Philosophical and Physical Opinions, she added a number of epistles and her “Condemning Treatise on Atoms” to the front matter and also extended the work beyond the earlier Philosophical Fancies significantly.

With the Restoration of Charles II to the throne, she returned to England with her husband and continued to write. In addition to publishing on natural philosophy, she also wrote essays on a remarkable variety of other topics, including the nature of poetry, the proper way to hold a feast, fame, women’s roles in society and many others. She also wrote many plays and poems, as well as a fantastic utopia, The Description of a New World, Called the Blazing World in 1668.

There may have been some controversy over a woman publishing works on natural philosophy, as she felt the need to include several epistles, both from herself and from her husband and brother-in-law, attesting to the fact that she had written these works herself. Indeed, she returns to defend herself as an author and natural philosopher at a number of different places in her work, often in epistles to the reader. She also defends the propriety of her being so bold as to write in her own name and to think her thoughts worthy of publication. Her several discussions of fame are worth noting in this context.

She continued to write on natural philosophy, among other topics, to growing attention. She sent her works to many of the well-known philosophers then operating in England, as well as to the faculties at Cambridge and Oxford. Indeed, after she had published her most famous work of natural philosophy, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy in 1666, she was invited to attend a meeting of the Royal Society, a privilege rarely granted to women at the time.

In all, she may be the most prolific woman writer of early modern Europe and certainly the most prolific woman philosopher. Depending on how one counts, she published over a dozen and perhaps as many as twenty works, at least five of which are works on natural philosophy and many more contain essays with substantive philosophical content.

2. Natural Philosophy

Cavendish wrote half a dozen of works on natural philosophy. Indeed, natural philosophy constituted the largest part of her philosophical output and a large part of her writing as a whole. Her philosophical commitments can be described as materialist, vitalist and panpsychist. In what follows, her philosophical discussions will be grouped around several recurring themes and arguments.

a. Materialism

Like Hobbes, Descartes or Bacon, Cavendish regularly motivates her position by attacking the Aristotelianism of the schools, mocking those whom her husband calls the “gown-tribe.” She criticized what she took to be their commitment to occult powers and incorporeal beings in nature and offers her materialism as an alternative. She explains that her intent is to provide a philosophical system accessible to all, without special training. From her earliest work, Philosophical Fancies, published in 1653, Cavendish argued for materialism in nature. In the first two chapters of that work, which she reprinted in Philosophical and Physical Opinions in 1655, she claims that nature is one infinite material thing, which she sometimes describes as “the substance of infinite matter” (“Condemning Treatise of Atomes”). This infinite material substance is composed of an infinite number of material parts, with infinite degrees of motion. Similarly, this motion is all of the same kind, differing from instance to instance only in swiftness or direction. In other words, the natural world is entirely constituted by a single type of stuff, which she calls matter and a single force, which she calls motion. She distinguishes the objects and events in nature from one another by the varying parts of matter, bearing different motions, within that one infinite material substance. She explicitly extends this materialist doctrine to the human mind in chapter 2 of the Philosophical Fancies, where she says that the forms of the gown-tribe, as well as human minds, are nothing but “matter moving, or matter moved.” Furthermore, she remained committed to this materialism throughout her career, such as in her Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy first published in 1666, claiming that all actions of sense or of reason are corporeal. Thus we see from the very beginning of her first work that she is a materialist.

The exact nature of her materialism develops over time, however. In her earliest work from 1653, she allows for an atomist account of nature and matter, though by 1656 she is already arguing against atomism in her “Condemning Treatise of Atomes”. Later, in her Observations from 1666, she provides at least two arguments against atomism. First, she argues that the concept of an extended yet indivisible body is incoherent, saying, “whatsoever has body, or is material, has quantity; and what has quantity, is divisible” (Ch. 31, 125); this is an argument that was commonly employed against atomism in the seventeenth century. She also argues that composite bodies, each with their own motions, could not account for the unity of the complex body, but would instead be like a swarm of bees or a school of fish. Atomism, she argues, cannot explain organic unity. She says, “[w]herefore, if there should be a composition of atoms, it would not be a body made of parts, but of so many whole and entire single bodies, meeting together as a swarm of bees…and the concourse of them would rather cause a confusion, than a conformity in nature” (Ch. 31, 129). Instead of atomism, Cavendish proposes that matter is both infinite in extension and always further divisible. Furthermore, for Cavendish, complex beings such as animals are composed of distinctive matter in motion, which she takes to provide them with their unity. Even so, her primary targets are not atomist materialism, as much as both the occultism of the Schools and the mechanism of some of her contemporaries.

She also applies her materialism to the human mind. In her early works, she suggests that there is nothing of the human being that is not material. For example, in her first work, she wrote a brief dialogue between body and mind, in which she claims that the only way the mind can attain any sort of life after the death of the body is by fame, that is, by being thought well of by others. Indeed, she elsewhere claims that “all the actions of sense and reason…are corporeal” and “sense and reason are the same in all creatures and all parts of nature” (Ch. 31, 128), as well as, “knowledge, being material, consists of parts” (Ch. 37, 160).

Cavendish seems to qualify her materialism with regard to the human soul later in her career, when she clarifies that her previously strong and consistent commitment to materialism only applies to the natural world. For example, in Observations, she claims that humans have both a material mind and, in addition, a supernatural, immaterial soul. She argues that the way, in which this supernatural soul is related to the material mind and body is itself supernatural. After all, she suggests, place is a property belonging only to bodies and thus, could not belong to an immaterial soul. Therefore, the way, in which the immaterial soul is related to the material person is itself a supernatural, that is, miraculous phenomenon. Unfortunately, she offers little explanation for this immaterial soul and refrains from explaining whether or how the immortal soul might interact at all with anything in nature, instead implying that it does not. To make matters even more confusing, she seems to amend her view in 1668 when claiming that only God is immaterial and all other things are material. It may be that she had changed her mind as to whether or not human beings have immaterial, supernatural souls, but the texts themselves do not seem to speak definitively.

Throughout her work, however, Cavendish did claim that human beings possess a material soul. She explains the material, natural soul in the same way, in which she explains the mind, through her distinction among the different degrees of motion in matter, as mentioned above. Briefly, she claims that matter may have differing degrees of motion, such that some matter is relatively inert and gross, that is, being composed of larger pieces of matter, which she sometimes calls “dull matter”. In contrast, there is also a finer and more rare matter, which possesses more motion. This faster and lighter matter infuses dull matter. The natural, material, human soul or mind, she explains, is the finer, rarer matter within our grosser, cruder material bodies. Scholars have noted the similarity this view bears to Stoic doctrine, in that the rarer, more quickly moving matter resembles the Stoic pneuma.

Just like the Stoics, she also explicitly states in her later works—and suggests at times in her earlier works—that all bodies are completely infused with varying degrees of this active matter. Indeed, it is this matter that accounts for the regularity of natural phenomena across all of nature. She says that “there can be no order, method or harmony, especially such as appears in the actions of nature, without there be reason to cause that order and harmony” (Ch 6, 207). She claims, for example, that animals possess motions visible externally, such as jumping or running, whereas vegetables and minerals possess and exhibit motions only detectable internally, such as contracting or dilating. She refers to the motions found in animals, vegetables and minerals to varying degrees as sensitive spirits, a term that calls to mind Descartes’ animal spirits. But even minerals and vegetables and also animals and humans possess a further, yet finer and more quickly moving form of matter, which she calls “rational spirits.” These rational spirits are the quickly moving, but rare pneuma-like matter described above, which ultimately explain the various motions and behaviors of the natural objects. Ultimately, though, these motions and the matter they infuse are of the same fundamental kind, differing only in their degree of motion. This view, coupled with her radical claims that “all motion is life” and “knowledge is motion” will lead to her vitalism and panpsychism.

Another of Cavendish’s distinctive commitments about the nature of matter is this: matter bears an infinite degree of motion and, crucially, it bears that motion eternally. In other words, if a bit of matter has a certain degree of motion, according to Cavendish, it cannot lose that degree of motion nor communicate it to another piece of matter. We might say that, for Cavendish, the particular degree of motion that a part of matter bears is essential to that part. Thus, the cruder and grosser matter that bears a lesser degree of matter does so by its nature and cannot lose or gain a degree of motion. Similarly, the more quickly moving, finer parts of matter also bear their greater degree of motion by nature and cannot gain, lose or communicate the motion either. This view is related to another major theme of Cavendish’s work, one that we might call vitalism.

b. Vitalism and the Variability Argument

In addition to her commitment to materialism, Cavendish took pains to reject a position that was often associated with materialism in the seventeenth century, namely that of mechanism. Mechanism can be understood as the view that the natural world, as well as human beings, are made up of uniform material components that interact according to laws of motion and collision. One statement of this view, with which Cavendish was familiar, can be found in the opening chapters of Thomas Hobbes’ Leviathan. René Descartes, too, provided a mechanistic account of the natural world—apart from his commitment to the existence of the immaterial souls of human beings, of course.

Cavendish argued that mechanism could not be an accurate account of the natural world, because it could not properly explain the world that we observe. She claimed that two notable features of the natural world are variety and orderliness. The world around us is full of a vast array of different sorts of creatures and things, each performing distinctive activities or bearing distinct properties. Despite the natural world’s plentitude, it was also orderly. If we understand the nature of a particular creature or substance, we could predict successfully how it might behave or react to certain stimuli. Cavendish reasoned that if the world was ultimately constituted by uniform matter, passively receiving and transferring motion, according to mathematical laws of collision, then the universe should be either entirely homogenous or entirely chaotic. In other words, if passive, uniform matter communicating motion was really all we had to explain nature, we would not be able to account for its variety and orderliness—it would lack one or the other.

Instead, she claimed, different parts of the infinite material substance bear different degrees of motion by nature. They cannot directly transfer motion from one body to another, since motion is a property of the body that possesses it and not as something that can exist apart from its body. Thus individual bodies cannot give or receive their motions. Hence, the phenomena we observe are not to be explained by reference to uniform pieces of matter exchanging motion via collision. Rather, she explains, what we see is like a dance, in which each body moves according to its own, distinctive, internal principle, such that a pattern might be created by the dancers on the dance floor. She explicitly offers this dance metaphor in her first work of 1653 and again in 1655. For example, when she explains perception, she claims that the rational spirits flow in and out of the body through the eyes and touch upon the object being perceived, intermixing with the rational spirits found therein. The object, possessing its own distinctive spirits and motions, dances a pattern before the rational spirits, which flow back into the eyes. These rational spirits then take up the dance themselves, flowing back into the brain and continuing the dance, which she takes to be sufficient for the mind’s perceiving the object in virtue of the mind’s containing the distinctive dance or pattern. In these early works, she further explains that the rational spirits copy these dances based on a “natural sympathy” among adjacent bodies, particularly between the rational spirits of the perceiver and object perceived. Note that, throughout this account of perception, motion is never transferred from one body to another. Instead, motions and “dances” are taken up from the internal activity of the rational spirits, that is, from the nature of the moving matter. The matter moves itself according to its own nature and initiates changes in its own motion via natural sympathy.

By the 1660s, though, she largely replaces the dance metaphor with the terms “imitation” and “figuring out”, the latter in the sense of tracing or copying a shape or distinctive pattern of motion. Even so, the account is largely the same. Her argument from the Observations could be reconstructed as follows:

Bodies move in orderly and infinitely variable ways.
Either they are moved by spirits or they are moved by bodies.
But not spirits because that is mysterious, so bodies.
If bodily motion issues from the body, then, it must issue from either inanimate matter (mechanism) or animate matter (vitalism).
But not inanimate matter (mechanism), for the mechanistic account of bodily motion, (such as animals spirits and inanimate fine particles that transmit force), cannot account for the infinite variety and orderliness of the activity in nature.
So the bodily cause of motion must be the body’s animate matter, which (it is alleged) has an ability to produce an infinite variety of orderly effects.

This is what might be called the argument from the variability and regularity of nature for self-moving matter. Premise 5 implies the argument that if the world was ultimately constituted by uniform matter, passively receiving and transferring motion, according to mathematical laws of collision, then the universe should be either entirely homogenous or entirely chaotic. In this argument for self-moving matter, many of the central themes of Cavendish’s natural philosophy are visible: her materialist rejection of incorporeal causes, her denial of mechanistic explanation and her resulting vitalism.

Another significant feature of her natural philosophy, and one that appears especially clearly when she critiques mechanism, is her refusal to take mathematical physics as an exemplar. Whereas Cartesian and Hobbesian natural philosophy could be described as attempts to understand nature with metaphors and modes of explanation taken from the new, mathematical physics, Cavendish instead draws from other sources, especially her personal experiences with country life and, less directly, the life sciences. When explaining natural phenomena, she often makes reference to the behaviors of animals and humans, as well as her awareness of botanical phenomena. She in fact reported in the 1650s that Gerald’s Herbal, a botanical reference book, was the only scientific work she had read. Perhaps because of this, she often explained the behaviors of an animal’s or plant’s rational spirits in terms of their macro-level behaviors, rather than in terms of atomic or corpuscular, mathematical explanation. By the 1660s, at least, we know that she had read and engaged the work of other vitalist and anti-mechanists, such as the alchemist Johannes Baptista Van Helmont. However, even before that time, her preference for biological metaphors over those of mathematical physics was evident.

Cavendish’s preference for biological modes of explanation can also be seen in her organicism. Not only does she deny atomism, but she also argues that the parts of bodies in part possess their distinctive motions and natures in virtue of the larger, organic systems, in which they are located. She says, “[f]or example: an eye, although it be composed of parts, and has a whole and perfect figure, yet it is but part of the head, and could not subsist without it” (Observations, Ch. 31). This is not an argument for organicism; instead, she means it as an analogy to illustrate her views on individuals more generally.

Despite the similarities of her vitalism to that of Van Helmont or perhaps Henry More, Cavendish also departs from them in her commitment to materialism. Indeed, she accounts for life in nature by claiming that “[a]ll motion is life,” even in her first work of 1653. Human beings are alive, she says, because they are material beings composed of matter with varying degrees of motion moving in a distinctive pattern. For Cavendish that is all that is needed for something to be alive. Note, though, that all things in nature, from humans and animals and plants down to minerals and artifacts, are the things they are, because they are composed of matter with distinctive patterns and degrees of motion. In this regard, she resembles Hobbes, even though she will ultimately reject his mechanistic view of matter, especially with her view that all matter is self-moving. We might therefore say that Cavendish’s natural philosophy is committed to pan-vitalism or animism, or even, as Cudworth would later say, hylozoism. But we must remember that her view departs from the Cambridge Platonists and Van Helmont in denying that the principles of life are to be explained by reference to incorporeal powers, entities or properties. All matter is to some extent alive and all of nature is infused with a principle of life, but this principle of life is simply motion.

Thus Cavendish provides a fairly deflationary account of life as motion and in this regard her natural philosophy may resemble Hobbes or Descartes. Despite this similarity, Cavendish again rejects their mechanism in her denial of determinism, even with regards to bodily interaction. Though she often appeals to the orderliness and regularity of nature in defending her theory of self-moving matter, she also recognizes the presence of disorder in nature, such as in disease. In fact, she explains illness or disease as the rebellion of a part of the body against the whole, explaining that some bits of matter have freely chosen alternative motions and thus disrupted the harmonious all. In short, Cavendish ascribes a libertarian freedom not only to human agents but even to the parts of matter themselves, explaining the behaviors of organisms with a social ‘body politic’ metaphor. We might say, then, that she draws from experiences of the biological and botanical world to explain her metaphysics, but she also incorporates a Hobbesian sense of the body politic into her metaphysics and in so doing reinforces her rejection of the mechanistic worldview.

However, Cavendish does not stop at explaining the principle of life by reference to degrees of motion in matter, because she also claims to explain mental representation and ultimately knowledge in this way. When a particular pattern of motion occurs in the brain, say, via perception, the person perceives the object; for the person to have an idea of the object is just for her brain to contain its distinctive motion. More generally, she takes the presence of such patterned motions in matter to mean that said matter has knowledge, at least in some sense. Yet she also argues that such motions can be found throughout all of nature, every body possessing its own distinctive motions. For these reasons, her vitalist materialism fits nicely with her panpsychism.

c. Panpsychism

In saying that all motion is life and that all things in nature are composed of matter with a degree of motion, Cavendish affirms that life permeates all of the natural world, including what we might call inanimate objects. For Cavendish, inanimate objects are alive, because they possess motion, though they might have a lesser degree of motion, and thus a lesser degree of life, than an animal or human being. Indeed, she also believes that knowledge is similarly diffused across all of nature to greater and lesser degrees. For these reasons, we might call Cavendish an incremental naturalist with regard to knowledge and life. That is, she takes distinctively human traits such as knowledge and life to be natural properties that are present to varying degrees throughout all of nature.

Throughout her work, Cavendish argues that whatever has motion has knowledge and that knowledge is innate or internally directed motion. In her Philosophical Fancies of 1653, she explains that

the touch of the heel, or any part of the body else, is the like motion, as the thought thereof in the head; the one is the motion of the sensitive spirits, the other in the rational spirits, as touch from the sensitive spirits, for thought is only a strong touch, and touch a weak thought. So sense is a weak knowledge, and knowledge a strong sense, made by the degrees of the spirits (Chapter 45).

In the next chapter she continues to argue that all matter exhibits regular motion, which occurs because all matter is infused with sensitive spirits; but to have sensitive spirits is to be able to sense; thus all matter senses things.

Now, in her earliest work, she offers at best a “who knows so why not” sort of argument that matter thinks, saying, “[i]f so, who knows, but vegetables and minerals may have some of those rational spirits, which is a mind or soul in them, as well as man?” and “if their [vegetables and minerals] knowledge be not the same knowledge, but different from the knowledge of animals, by reason of their different figures, made by other kind of motion on other tempered matter, yet it is knowledge” (Chapter 46).

Later, for example in her Observations, she argues that the regularity of nature can best—or perhaps only—be explained by admitting that all material bodies possess knowledge. She argues that matter and material beings exhibit regular motion and then argues that “there can be no regular motion without knowledge, sense, and reason” (Observations, 129). Furhtermore, she argues that each part of the body and each object in nature exhibits a distinctive activity. The brain thinks; the stomach digests; the loins produce offspring—and they do so in regular and consistent ways. Indeed, each of these organs or parts of the body are themselves also composite, made up of an infinite number of smaller bodies. What unites them, however, is their distinctive motions, producing their distinctive behaviors. And Cavendish takes each of these distinctive motions to be a kind of knowledge.

She argues that we ought to think of these distinctive motions as knowledge, because that is the best, or perhaps only, way to explain the regularity and stability of these composites. If these parts are to do these things, they must know what they do, especially given the regular and consistent ways in which they do them. Indeed, without matter knowing its own distinctive motions, she argues, perception would be impossible. She says, “[s]elf-knowledge is the ground, or fundamental cause of perception: for were there not self-knowledge, there could not be perception” (Observations, 155). In short, all material entities, which is to say all things in nature, possess knowledge. The view that all things in nature possess mind or mental properties is panpsychism, to which Cavendish is committed here.

Even so, she uses the concept of knowledge in an unusual way. When she ascribes knowledge to a rock, or to my liver for example, but she neither necessarily means that the rock or my liver have mental states like ours nor that they can perceive their environments in the same way we do. For Cavendish, the knowledge of a thing like a mirror is, indeed, conditioned by the sort of motions that constitute the mirror, the motions that make it the thing it is; as such, mirror-knowledge and mirror-perception are very different from their human analogues. Even so, the mirror’s perception and knowledge are in some ways analogous to human perception and knowledge; both involve the object’s patterning out its own matter in a way, which copies or resembles an external object. Despite this similarity between a mirror and a human, the human being is composed of matter capable of many different kinds of perception and knowledge, whereas the mirror has a very limited ability to pattern out or reflect its environment. And the human has sufficient amounts of rational spirits uniting its parts to be able to conduct rational inquiry, whereas the rational matter of a mirror is very limited indeed.

This might sound as though she is walking back her commitment to panpsychism, but in fact she is not. For these parts or degrees of matter that possess varying levels of awareness are in fact entirely intermixed together in all things. She says, “there is a double perception in all parts of nature, to wit, rational and sensitive…. I believe there is sense and reason, or sensitive and rational knowledge, not only in all creatures, but in every part of every particular creature” (Ch. 36). Thus the rock, though it possesses a great deal of duller matter, also possesses sensitive and even rational spirits within. So Cavendish says,

self-motion is the cause of all the various…actions of nature; these cannot be performed without perception: for all actions are knowing and perceptive; and, were there no perceptions, there could not possibly be any such actions: for, how should parts agree, either in generation, composition, or dissolution of composed figures, if they had no knowledge or perception of each other? (Ch. 37, 167).

In short, Cavendish’s natural philosophy is materialist, vitalist and panpsychist, as well as anti-atomist and anti-mechanist. Unlike many of her opponents who favor mathematical physics, she takes the living things—and the limited awareness of the life sciences—as a model for her natural philosophy, as evidenced in her organicism, as well as her particular use of metaphor. In other words, she agrees with Descartes and Hobbes against the occult explanations of the Scholastics, with More and Van Helmont against the reductive mechanism of Hobbes and Descartes and with Hobbes and Stoic materialism against the incorporeal principles of More and Van Helmont.

d. God

Cavendish’s views on God are puzzling. She regularly repeats that we cannot assert the existence of things that are not observable material objects in the natural world and she does so in a way that might suggest to the modern reader that she does not believe in the immortality of the soul or the existence of an immaterial God. This would likely be a mistake, however, as there are several passages where she instead explains that she does not include God in her speculations, because we cannot speak with any degree of confidence about God’s nature. Though God is mostly absent from her work in the 1650s, in the Observations she says, “there is an infinite difference between divine attributes, and natural properties; wherefore to similize [sic] our reason, will, understanding, faculties, passions and figures etc. to God, is too high a presumption, and in some manner a blasphemy” (“Further Observations”, Ch 10, 215) and “God is incomprehensible, and above nature: but inasmuch as can be known, to wit, his being [i.e., that he exists]; and that he all-powerful…eternal, infinite, omnipotent, incorporeal, individual, immovable being” (*Further Observations*, Ch 11, 216-17). This certainly suggests that she takes God to exist or, at least, that she takes questions of his existence and nature to lie largely outside of the realm of natural philosophy and instead, perhaps, to be a matter of faith alone.

Nevertheless, we might speculate on the details of her views. As mentioned above, her views on the existence of a supernatural soul seem to be in tension with her other metaphysical commitments. Similarly, her views on the existence of an immaterial God seem similarly in tension. Interestingly, she attaches an erratum on the final page of her first work, Philosophical Fancies, apologizing to the reader for having omitted the appropriate pieties and references to God in her natural philosophical system. What is even stranger is that, when she would reprint and re-write that system in her 1656 Philosophical and Physical Opinions, she would again omit any references to God and instead include the same erratum a second time.

Even so, it is unlikely she thought of herself as an atheist. Perhaps, as some scholars have interpreted Thomas Hobbes, she simply believed that she had no business discussing the nature of God’s existence as that was not a matter of rational inquiry but mere faith. It should be noted, however, that her several discussions of fame suggest that she was not convinced that she would have an existence after her own death.

3. Political Philosophy

In addition to her substantial work on natural philosophy, Cavendish also wrote many other works in a variety of genres, from essays on social issues to poems and plays, even the fantastic utopian fiction The Blazing World. Unlike her work on natural philosophy, however, in which she sets out her views in relatively systematic ways and in philosophical treatises, her thoughts on social or political issues appear in works of fiction or in essays strongly conditioned by rhetorical devices. For example, in Orations of Divers Sorts, she speaks in a variety of voices, imagining several fictional interlocutors who present a number of positions on issues, without indicating the author’s own views. Similarly, in her fiction, she often has several characters advocate for philosophical positions, which complicates any attribution of that view we might make to the author herself. Indeed, in The Blazing World Margaret Cavendish, the Duchess of Newcastle, appears as a character, who advises the Empress of the Blazing World on how her society ought to be governed. In this case, we might feel fairly confident that the views espoused by the character of Cavendish accord with the author’s own, but such attributions should be made only tentatively. Despite the challenges presented by the genres, in which she chose to address these issues, we might still attribute certain general views to her. Among the recurring issues she addressed are aristocracy, gender and fame.

a. Religious Liberty

To see the difficulty in ascribing unambiguous views to Cavendish in these works, consider her thoughts on liberty and stability. In her 1666 fictional work The Blazing World, an Empress restructured her subjects into professional scientific societies. In the story, this change results in a breakdown of social harmony; the old institutions, by which the society had harmoniously functioned, begin to fail, there is strife and faction, and anarchy and civil war loom. Into this situation arrives the character of Margaret Cavendish who advises the formation of a single state sponsored religion. She further instructs the Empress in architectural details, indicating that an imposing cathedral be built from a magical burning stone found in this fictional world. Made, again, by some magical device, to float above the city, with a voice issuing from the Church with booming decrees that the old ways be reinstated, with everyone being born into and retaining the stations. The character of Cavendish proposes that doing so will cow the factious citizens and make them agree, so that cobblers will beget cobblers, soldiers give rise to soldiers and so on. When the Empress executes this plan social harmony is restored. This suggests to the reader that the author Cavendish opposes the sort of political progress that the Empress had proposed; the reader might also conclude that Cavendish supports the institution of a strong state Church.

Yet in her 1662 Orations of Divers Sorts, she states in one of her orations that, if the people have already adopted a variety of religious views, then the government should grant liberty of conscience—that is, freedom of religion—because doing so is the only way to maintain peace. Indeed she says explicitly there that the government should grant this liberty, because a failure to do so will result in anarchy. Then, in the next oration immediately after, she argues from a different perspective, claiming instead that liberty of conscience would lead to liberty in the state, which in turn would result in anarchy. Political liberty, she claims, undermines the rule of law, without which there can be no justice and thus there will be anarchy. Finally, she presents a third oration in defense of a middle view. There she argues that liberty of conscience is acceptable if it concerns only private devotions, but not if it disrupts the public. In other words, if their religious beliefs do neither violate any laws nor harm the public, then those beliefs are to be allowed. We might speculate that she intends this final, middle view to be taken as the author’s own, but it is not always clear, especially when, rather than presenting two views and concluding with a compromise, she instead presents six or seven different opinions, as she does on the question of whether women are equal to men. Even so, the reader may suspect that, in this case, the compromise view is closest to Cavendish’s own.

One feature that unites these varied discussions, however, is Cavendish’s fundamental commitment to the importance of political stability. In each of the above cases, she motivates her position by assuming that social and political stability must be preserved above all. All the orations, as well as the character of Cavendish in The Blazing World, seem to assume that political stability is the goal and that the sovereign ought to employ whatever means will be successful in securing it. Like Hobbes, then, Cavendish takes the primary function of the State to provide stability. This attitude recurs in her defenses of royalism and aristocracy.

b. Royalism and Aristocracy

Cavendish came from a family of royalists, served as a maid in waiting to Queen Henrietta Maria during her and Charles the Second’s exile from England at the hands of the republican revolutionaries of Cromwell and married one of Charles’s staunchest royalist supporters, William Cavendish, Duke of Newcastle. Her commitment to royalism and, more generally, to aristocracy, appears frequently in her writing. When she discusses how a country ought to be governed, she is unwavering in her view that states are best ruled by a King or Queen, who should come from the aristocracy.

One can draw an interesting analogy between her natural philosophy and her politics here. When discussing the distinction between health and illness in animals, Cavendish describes the organism as a body politic; the healthy body is one, in which each part of the body plays its role appropriately, whereas a diseased body is one, in which one or more parts are in rebellion, acting against their natures, to the detriment of the whole organism. Indeed, given her vitalism and panpsychism, she might describe disease in the human body and political unrest or rebellion in remarkably similar terms. In both cases, the whole body is composed of a variety of different parts, each with its own distinctive activity or motion. Each part knows its role, its place, in the body politic, yet each part is free to direct its motions in a way contrary to its natural activity. If a part chooses to do so, it will throw the orderly harmony of the whole out of balance. To expand upon this metaphysical account, we might say that, for Cavendish, people have certain stations—roles and places—in society from birth by nature and social harmony is achieved when the citizens conduct themselves according to their knowledge of their own distinctive activities. As long as the cobblers cobble, the soldiers defend, the judges judge and the rulers rule, social harmony will be maintained and each person can cultivate themselves accordingly.

Indeed, this seems to be one of the central features of Cavendish the character’s advice to the Empress in The Blazing World. Being a fantastical and quasi-science fictional story, The Blazing World features citizens of a variety of animal species, all sentient, capable of human language and so on. Originally, each species has their own distinctive roles, belonging to their own, species-specific guilds. It is to this world that Cavendish urges the Empress to return, one where the citizens are like different species, each with their own peculiar skills and roles received in virtue of what sorts of people their parents were. If the people of The Blazing World simply accepted the stations into which they were born, social harmony would be regained. It is difficult not to see this as a parable of the Restoration of Charles II and the English aristocracy; peace is restored to England by the return of the aristocracy. Moreover, in 1665, the year before The Blazing World was published, her family was restored their lands and her husband was advanced to Dukedom for his service to the King during the Civil Wars.

c. Gender

Cavendish is also described at times as an early feminist. To be sure, her own remarkable life as an author and philosopher leads many to take her as an exemplar; one might say she was a feminist in deed, if not always in word.

Beyond that, though, some scholars argue that her writings are feminist as well. For many of the reasons cited above, such claims can be complicated. Consider the seven orations on women in her Orations of Divers Sorts. There she presents seven speeches that take up a variety of positions. She begins by lamenting the fact that men possess all the power and women entirely lack it. In a subsequent oration, she speculates that women lack power in society, due to natural inferiority. She then counters in the next oration that women might be able to achieve as much as men were they given the opportunity to engage in traditionally masculine activities. But the next speaker claims that, were women to imitate men in this way, they would become “hermaphroditical.” Instead, this orator suggests, women should cultivate feminine virtues such as chastity and humility. In the very next oration, however, the orator suggests that feminine virtues are inferior to masculine, so women should pursue masculine virtues instead. She concludes the series of orations on this topic with a new position, arguing that women are in fact superior to men because women, through their beauty, can control men.

What is the reader to make of this series of orations? It seems likely that Cavendish affirms the following empirical facts about her society: women lack power; women could gain fame and even perhaps power if they pursued masculine virtues; they might even be equally capable as men in cultivating these virtues; yet women would be despised if they did pursue these virtues; if women cultivated feminine virtues, they would not be despised and could even acquire a kind of indirect power, but such a state of affairs is ultimately inferior to the power men possess. What is less clear is whether Cavendish really believes that the pursuit of so-called masculine virtues would somehow harm women by causing them to deny their natures. In other words, it is not clear from these orations whether Cavendish thinks women are naturally inferior to men. In her earlier Worlds Olio, on the other hand, she seems less ambivalent, claiming that women are in general inferior to men at rhetoric. Some women may cultivate skill in rhetoric to rival and even exceed that of men, but they are few, she claims, in this work.

Some readers might point to The Blazing World, and to the power of the Empress or the success of the character of Cavendish as a political adviser. It is true that the Empress leads her people in a successful naval battle, defeating a mortal enemy of her homeland. A similar event occurs in her story Bell in Campo. Even so, the considerations above suggest that social harmony is restored because she returns to aristocratic values. After all, the notion that a woman might lead an empire, even into war, would not be so foreign to an English subject in the 1660s, given that Queen Elizabeth ruled just a few decades before and had overseen the important naval defeat of the Spanish Armada.

From her first work and throughout her career, Cavendish engaged the issue of women in her writing, reflecting on her own experience as a woman and how, or whether, it shaped her writing or philosophy. Thus, with her impressive life and regular consideration of the relevance of gender to her thought, Cavendish can be seen as an important precursor for later more explicitly feminist writers, even if she herself might not be aptly so described.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Cavendish’s Works in the 17th Century

Only the first publication is listed for each work; Cavendish revised and reprinted several of her works multiple times over the years. So, for example, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy first appeared in 1666 but reappeared, with the addition of The Blazing World, in 1668. And Grounds of Natural Philosophy is a substantially revised version of her earlier Philosophical and Physical Opinions, itself, which contained her early Philosophical Fancies as its first part.

Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical Fancies, London: printed by Thomas Roycroft for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1653.
Cavendish, Margaret, The World’s Olio, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1655.
Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical and Physical Opinions, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1655.
Cavendish, Margaret, Nature’s Pictures, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1656.
Cavendish, Margaret, Plays, London: printed for J. Martin, J. Allestrye and T. Dicas, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, Orations of Divers Sorts, Accommodated to Divers Places, London: printed by W. Wilson, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, ‘Bell in Campo’, in Playes, London: J. Martin, J. Allestrye and T. Dicas, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, Sociable Letters, London: printed by William Wilson, 1664.
Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical Letters, London: possibly printed by David Maxwell, 1664.
Cavendish, Margaret, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy, London: printed by Anne Maxwell, 1666.
Cavendish, Margaret, The Description of a New World, Called the Blazing World, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1666.
Cavendish, Margaret, Life of William, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1667.
Cavendish, Margaret, Grounds of Natural Philosophy, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1668.

b. Modern Editions of Her Works

Cavendish, Margaret, The Description Of A New World, Called The Blazing World And Other Writings, ed, Kate Lilley. London: William Pickering, 1992.
Cavendish, Margaret, Paper Bodies: A Margaret Cavendish Reader, eds. Sylvia Bowerbank and Sara Mendelson. Peterborough, ON: Broadview Press, 2000.
Cavendish, Margaret, Observations upon Experimental Philosophy, ed. Eileen O’Neill. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Cavendish, Margaret, Margaret Cavendish: Political Writings, ed. Susan James. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.

c. Secondary Literature

Battigelli, Anna, 1998, Margaret Cavendish and The Exiles of the Mind, Lexington: The University Press of Kentucky.
- An overview of Cavendish’s life and works from a scholar of English literature, with discussions on genre and rhetorical devices in her works.
Boyle, Deborah, 2006,“Fame, Virtue, and Government: Margaret Cavendish on Ethics and Politics,” Journal of the History of Ideas, 67: 251–289.
- One of the few discussions of Cavendish’s ethics, with a productive focus on fame.
Boyle, Deborah, 2013, “Margaret Cavendish on Gender, Nature, and Freedom,” Hypatia 28 (3): 516-532.
- An excellent account of the complexities of Cavendish on gender.
Broad, Jacqueline, 2002, Women Philosophers of the Seventeenth Century, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- This text contains a chapter on Cavendish.
Clucas, Stephen, 1994, “The Atomism of the Cavendish Circle: A Reappraisal,” The Seventeenth Century, 9: 247–273.
- Clucas argues that Cavendish never really gave up atomism.
Cunning, David, 2006, “Cavendish on the Intelligibility of the Prospect of Thinking Matter,” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 23: 117–136.
- A discussion of Cavendish and the notion of thinking matter, with connections to contemporary philosophy of mind.
Cunning, David, 2010, “Margaret Lucas Cavendish,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2006, “Atomism, Monism, and Causation in the Natural Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish,” in Daniel Garber and Steven Nadler (eds.), Oxford Studies in Early Modern Philosophy, 3: 199–240
- A long and thorough exploration of some themes in Cavendish’s metaphysics. She refutes Clucas on atomism and provides an insightful analysis on causation.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2007, “Reason and Freedom: Margaret Cavendish on the Order and Disorder of Nature,” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 89: 157–191.
- Detlefsen notes that matter itself must be free of necessity, in order to explain the disorder in nature that Cavendish allows for, especially in disease, in part via a ‘body politic’ analogy.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2009, “Margaret Cavendish on the Relationship Between God and World,” Philosophy Compass, 4: 421–438.
- An overview of Cavendish’s views on God.
Duncan, Stewart, 2013, “Cavendish and the Divine, Supernatural, Immaterial Soul,” The Mod Squad: A Group Blog in Modern Philosophy, Accessed November 4, 2014.
- A discussion and consideration of the nature and role of the supernatural soul in Cavendish’s metaphysics.
Duncan, Stewart, 2012, “Debating Materialism: Cavendish, Hobbes, and More,” History of Philosophy Quarterly 29 (4): 391-409.
- An analysis of Cavendish that clarifies and contextualizes her materialism vis-à-vis Hobbes and More, with whom her thought shares some important similarities.
Hutton, Sarah, 1997, “In Dialogue with Thomas Hobbes: Margaret Cavendish’s natural philosophy,” Women’s Writing, 4: 421–432.
- Cavendish’s debt, and response, to Hobbes’s metaphysics.
James, Susan, 1999, “The Philosophical Innovations of Margaret Cavendish,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 7: 219–244.
- An excellent overview of the major themes in Cavendish’s metaphysics.
James, Susan, 2003, “Introduction,” in Margaret Cavendish: Political Writings, ed. Susan James, Cambridge: Cambridge UP (2003).
- An overview of Cavendish’s social and political themes.
Kroetsch, Cameron, 2013, “List of Margaret Cavendish’s Texts, Printers, and Booksellers,” The Digital Cavendish Project, Accessed November 4, 2014.
- A detailed account of the printing and publishing of Cavendish’s works.
Lascano, Marcy. “An Introduction to Margaret Cavendish, or ‘Why You Should Include Margaret Cavendish in Your Early Modern Course and Buy the Book.’” The Mod Squad, A Group Blog in Early Modern Philosophy. Accessed July 14, 2014.
- Lascano makes a compelling case for the inclusion of Cavendish in Early Modern Philosophy survey courses.
Lewis, Eric, 2001, “The Legacy of Margaret Cavendish,” Perspective on Science, 9: 341–365.
- An overview of Cavendish’s reception, both among her contemporaries and ours. Valuable in part for its identification of lacunae in recent scholarship.
Michaelian, Kourken, 2009, “Margaret Cavendish’s Epistemology,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 17: 31–53.
- The only extended discussion of Cavendish’s epistemology, with a special focus on her distinction of internal and external knowledge.
O’Neill, Eileen, 1998, “Disappearing Ink: Early Modern Women Philosophers and Their Fate in History,” in Janet A. Kourany (ed.), Philosophy in a Feminist Voice, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- The locus classicus for discussion of the way in which women philosophers were written out of histories in the past two centuries.
O’Neill, Eileen, 2001, “Introduction,” in Margaret Cavendish, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy, Eileen O’Neill (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, x-xxxvi.
- An excellent account of Cavendish’s mature thought, in what is arguably her greatest work.
Sarasohn, Lisa, 2010, The Natural Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish: Reason and Fancy During the Scientific Revolution, Baltimore, MA: The Johns Hopkins University Press.
- An examination of Cavendish’s natural philosophy by an historian of science.
Whitaker, Katie, 2002, Mad Madge: The Extraordinary Life of Margaret Cavendish, Duchess of Newcastle, the First Woman to Live by Her Pen, New York: Basic Books.
- An entertaining biography of Cavendish.

Author Information

Gwendolyn Marshall
Email: eumarsha@fiu.edu
Florida International University
U. S. A.

Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716)

Widely hailed as a universal genius, Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz was one of the most important thinkers of the late 17^th and early 18^th centuries. A polymath and one of the founders of calculus, Leibniz is best known philosophically for his metaphysical idealism; his theory that reality is composed of spiritual, non-interacting “monads,” and his oft-ridiculed thesis that we live in the best of all possible worlds. Though these ideas may make his philosophy seem exceedingly abstract, Leibniz had keen interest in less abstract fields, such as empirical physics and jurisprudence. He also made great contributions to logic, with some considering him the greatest logician since Aristotle.

Due to his belief in a rationally ordered universe, his commitment to the principle of sufficient reason, and his acceptance of innate ideas, Leibniz is rightly ranked along with Descartes and Spinoza as one of the seminal early modern rationalists. Leibniz stands out in this tradition, however, for his novel efforts to find compatibility between classical and modern thought. He retained ancient and scholastic notions such as substantial form and final cause, while at the same time attempting to improve upon the mechanical philosophies of Hobbes, Spinoza, and Descartes. He also hoped his comprehensive philosophical system would serve as a common ground for uniting the determinedly divided Christian denominations in Europe. Such irenic pursuits make Leibniz a unique transitional figure in the history of philosophy. He has been called both the last in the lineage of great Christian Platonists and the first thinker to tackle the intellectual problems of modern Europe. After an introduction to his life and works, this article examines the key elements of Leibniz’s ambitious philosophical program.

Life and Writings
Key Principles
Metaphysics
Theodicy
Epistemology
Ethics
1. Intellect and Will
2. Justice and Charity
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources: Leibniz Texts and Translations
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Writings

Leibniz was born on 1 July 1646, during the waning years of the Thirty Years’ War, in the Lutheran town of Leipzig. His father, Friedrich, was professor of moral philosophy at the University in Leipzig. His mother, Catherina Schmuck, was the daughter of a law professor. Leibniz grew up in an educated, and by all accounts, orthodox Lutheran environment. Between the books of his father, those of his maternal grandfather, and the contributions of Friedrich’s bookselling former father-in-law, Leibniz had access to an impressive library. At a young age, he gained a love for classical literature and the writings of the Church Fathers.

From 1661-63, Leibniz pursued university studies in Leipzig, with a brief stay at the university in Jena in 1663. At the time, the curriculum at these universities was still largely scholastic with some pedagogical practices bearing traces of the Ramist encyclopedic tradition. Leibniz’s main teachers, Jakob Thomasius in Leipzig and Erhard Weigel in Jena, were Aristotelians with eclectic interests. Leibniz had his own eclectic interests, having gained some, mostly second-hand, familiarity with modern mechanical philosophy. Later in his life, he recounted a fateful stroll through the Rosental in Leipzig in which he debated the respective merits of scholastic and modern thinking. “Mechanism finally prevailed,” he recalled, “and led me to apply myself to mathematics” (G III, 606). Though steeped in classical and scholastic learning, Leibniz at quite a young age fashioned himself a man of the times.

Leibniz went on to pursue a degree in law, earning his doctorate from the University in Altdorf in 1666. His writings from his student years include his bachelor’s dissertation, A Metaphysical Disputation on the Principle of Individuation, an early work in combinatorial logic titled A Dissertation on the Art of Combinations, and works on legal theory.

After short stints in Nuremburg and Frankfurt, Leibniz took his first major employment in the Catholic court of the Prince-Archbishop of Mainz, Johann Philipp von Schӧnborn in 1668. Leibniz was tasked with reforming legal codes and statutes. During his time in Mainz, Leibniz struck up an important relationship with Baron Johann Christian von Boineburg, the central statesman in the Mainz court. Boineburg appreciated Leibniz’s considerable talents and set before him the task of solving the day’s most pressing philosophical and theological questions. Through his association with Boineburg, Leibniz began to see the challenges modern philosophy, especially the materialism of Gassendi and Hobbes, posed to belief in the immortality of the soul, to belief in God and natural law, and to both Catholic and Lutheran understandings of the Eucharist. Leibniz thus from 1668-70 began working on a number of preliminary studies meant to be part of a comprehensive work entitled Catholic Demonstrations. Though this dreamed-of magnum opus never materialized, Leibniz never abandoned his goal of developing a modern philosophy congenial to Christian theology. In addition to his Catholic Demonstrations writings, Leibniz’s Elements of Natural Law, written between 1669 and 1671, also contributed to these efforts. Furthermore, during this period Leibniz intensified his interest in physics, writing the Theory of Abstract Motion and the New Physical Hypothesis, and penning an unanswered letter to Thomas Hobbes on the Englishman’s physical theory as it relates to the philosophy of mind. Leibniz in hindsight found these youthful physical works unimpressive, but they attest to the diversity of his interests.

Mainz opened Leibniz to an extraordinarily broad range of philosophical concerns; his most intense period of intellectual development soon followed. In 1672, Leibniz was dispatched to Paris on a diplomatic mission as well as on personal business for Boineburg. Paris exposed Leibniz to learning, resources, and interlocutors the likes of which he had never seen. He had access to the unpublished writings of Descartes and Pascal. He met with leading Parisian intellectuals Antoine Arnauld and Nicholas Malebranche. He studied mathematics under the Dutch mathematician Christiaan Huygens. He twice visited London, in 1673 and 1676, meeting with the mathematicians and physicists of the Royal Society. Leibniz’s friend Walther von Tschirnhaus, though forbidden from showing Leibniz an advanced copy, apprised Leibniz of many of the contents of Spinoza’s Ethics. This led Leibniz, upon leaving Paris in 1676, to make an excursion to The Hague to visit Spinoza.

Paris and London offered Leibniz the opportunity to establish himself as a rising star in the European intellectual orbit and Leibniz did not squander his chance. By 1675 he had developed the infinitesimal calculus, only three years after he started the serious study of contemporary mathematics. He also continued to write on a wide range of philosophical topics. His Confession of a Philosopher of 1672-3 was his first response to the problem of evil and to the question of determinism. His most important collection of metaphysical papers from the period, De summa rerum, contains some of Leibniz’s early responses to Spinoza’s monism, with budding reflections on the relationship between mind and body, on the nature of the continuum, and on universal harmony.

In 1676, Leibniz accepted a position in the court of Duke Johann Friedrich of Hanover, employed mainly to serve as court librarian and to consult on engineering projects in the Harz mines. After his taste of the intellectual scenes in Paris and London, Leibniz found life in Hanover a disappointment. Despite his lack of professional prospects, Leibniz would in the ensuing decade sharpen his intellectual vision. He published a number of important essays on mathematics, epistemology, and physics in the new journal Acta Eruditorum. In 1686, while it snowed in the Harz, Leibniz composed “a little discourse on metaphysics.” Now published without the diminutive “little,” the Discourse on Metaphysics is widely considered Leibniz’s first mature philosophical statement. Leibniz sent a summary of the Discourse to Arnauld, sparking an extended and illuminating correspondence between them on issues of freedom, causality, and occasionalism.

In 1689, Leibniz travelled to Italy on official business, researching possible ancestral ties to the Guelf Dukes of Hanover. Leibniz, never one to let official duties interfere with his own intellectual agenda, used the opportunity to pitch his metaphysics to leading Catholic intellectuals. He also wrote works on cosmology in efforts to exonerate the Copernican system from Vatican censure.

Leibniz returned in 1690 to Hanover, which remained his home base until his death. Leibniz continued to write prodigiously and we can mention here only a small sample of his works. 1695 saw the publication of the first part of his Specimen of Dynamics and his New System of Nature. The former work included Leibniz’s reflections on the nature of force, and in many ways was developed in response to Newton’s Principia Mathematica; the latter was Leibniz’s first public presentation of his theory of pre-established harmony. In 1703, Leibniz began work on The New Essays on Human Understanding, a book-length dialogue in response to Locke’s Essay on Human Understanding. The only book Leibniz published during his lifetime, the Theodicy, was released in 1710. In this work, Leibniz defends his thesis that we live in best of all possible worlds and defends the reasonableness of Christianity against the fideism and skepticism of Pierre Bayle. In 1714, Leibniz wrote the Monadology, the last comprehensive summary statement of his philosophical views.

Throughout his years in Hanover, Leibniz maintained a stunning number of epistolary correspondents. Notable among these were Samuel Clark, Burchard de Volder, Johann Bernoulli, Bartholomew Des Bosses, and Christian Wolff. Leibniz also corresponded and often met with Sophie, Electress of Hanover, and her daughter Sophie Charlotte, Queen of Prussia. These women encouraged, and in many ways made possible, Leibniz’s philosophical pursuits while employed at the court.

Leibniz’s final years were clouded by charges that he stole ideas from the papers of Isaac Newton when developing the calculus in the 1670s. Leibniz has been cleared of the charges and it is now accepted that the two men developed the calculus independently. Leibniz died on 14 November 1716 after struggles with gout and arthritis.

Unlike the other major philosophical lights of his era, and despite having written more than any of them, Leibniz produced no magnum opus. He seemed most at home in dialogue, in correspondence, and in controversy. The Discourse on Metaphysics and Monadology are his most commonly studied works in metaphysics. Scholars disagree about the extent to which the two works are in accord, but they together provide a solid grounding in Leibniz’s thought. The Theodicy is a classic of philosophical theology and the New Essays provides the fullest account of Leibniz’s epistemology. This article will summarize Leibniz’s philosophy mainly as it is presented in these works. It would be a mistake, however, to think that one can get a full picture of Leibniz’s interests from these works and the reader is encouraged to consult the many excellent edited selections of Leibniz’s texts.

2. Key Principles

Several key principles form the core of Leibniz’s philosophy. Though Leibniz never lists these serially in the manner of, for instance, the axioms of Spinoza’s Ethics, the principles nonetheless shape Leibniz’s thinking and ground his major claims. He refers to them throughout his writings and we shall refer to them throughout our discussion. Though each of these principles merits further analysis in its own right, we introduce them only briefly here. Truly unique to Leibniz is not so much these principles in themselves as the use to which he collectively puts them.

In the Monadology, Leibniz writes that we reason “based on two great principles” (M 30). The first of these is the principle of contradiction, which deems every contradiction to be false. Classically stated, the principle of contradiction holds that something cannot be both “x” and “not x” at the same time and in the same respect. Aristotle claimed that all logic and reasoning presupposes the principle of contradiction and Leibniz sees no reason to think otherwise.

The second great principle of reason is the principle of sufficient reason, “by virtue of which we consider that we can find no true or existent fact, no true assertion, without there being a sufficient reason why it is thus and not otherwise, although most of these reasons cannot be known to us” (M 31). The classical statement of the principle of sufficient reason is nihil sine ratione: there is nothing without reason or cause. Leibniz holds that every state of affairs has an explanation, even if we must admit that we often do not have sufficient information to provide an explanation. The principle of sufficient reason assumes great prominence in Leibniz’s philosophy, most notably in his accounts of substance, causality, freedom, and optimism.

Closely related to the principle of sufficient reason is the principle of the best. This principle holds that rational beings always choose, and act for, the best. In this way, reason is teleologically ordered towards goodness. On Leibniz’s thinking, if reason did not opt for what is best, it would act arbitrarily; it would not have a sufficient reason for choosing one option over another, thus violating reason’s second great principle. Goodness provides the sufficient reason for rational choice. The principle of the best manifests itself differently in the cases of God and created minds. God, whom Leibniz considers “an absolutely perfect being” (DM 1), and who thus knows what is best, always acts in the best way. Created minds, who have a finite degree of perfection and thus limited knowledge of what is best, always act according to what seems the best from their limited perspectives.

The predicate-in-notion principle provides Leibniz’s notion of truth: praedicatum inest subjecto. In any true, affirmative proposition the predicate is contained in the subject. In order for the proposition, “Leibniz is a mathematician,” to be true, the idea “mathematician” must somehow be included in the idea “Leibniz.” Leibniz’s interpretation of the predicate-in-notion principle, we shall see, has far-reaching consequences for his metaphysics. Somewhat relatedly, Leibniz affirms the principle of the identity of indiscernibles, which states that any two objects sharing all properties are in fact the same, identical object. Each individual object contains some individuating characteristic. Important for Leibniz, this individuating characteristic must be something intrinsic to the individual, and not simply a separation in space and time, which Leibniz considers purely extrinsic denominations. The principle of the identity of indiscernibles is tied closely to the predicate-in-notion principle insofar as the latter makes intrinsic properties the basis of all truth and the former makes such properties the basis for identity and individuation.

A final key principle worth noting is the principle of continuity. “Nothing takes place suddenly, and it is one of my great principles that nature never makes leaps,” Leibniz writes in the New Essays. “I call this the Law of continuity” (NE 56). All change is continuous; there is never a leap, but rather a series of intervening stages. This principle is especially germane to Leibniz’s development of the infinitesimal calculus, but relevant too to his metaphysics and epistemology.

3. Metaphysics

a. Substantial Forms

One of the earliest intellectual projects Leibniz set for himself was to determine the proper relationship between the Aristotelian philosophy taught at his university in Leipzig and the new, mechanical philosophy espoused by thinkers like Galileo, Descartes, and Hobbes. Leibniz embraces modern, mechanical physics as the proper method for investigating nature, yet he is distinctive among 17^th century thinkers for the depths of his efforts to retain several key metaphysical concepts of ancient and medieval philosophy. Chief among these concepts is the Aristotelian idea of substantial form. Though Leibniz does not adopt the traditional understanding of substantial form in its details, his grappling with the legitimacy of this notion sets the trajectory for much of his metaphysics.

Aristotle, with the medieval scholastics following him, argues that any individual thing consists of a substantial form, which determines the kind of thing it is, and matter, which individuates the thing and makes it numerically distinct from other like substances. So, a particular squirrel consists of the universal form “squirrel” shaping and directing particular material stuff. In the 17^th century, the idea that substantial forms should enter into physical accounts of nature becomes especially odious. Citing “squirrelness,” the moderns maintain, tells us nothing regarding the activity of a squirrel. For thinkers such as Hobbes and Descartes, substantial forms are useless fictions, at best superfluous and at worst misleading. The mathematically-based, mechanical laws governing matter in motion suffice to explain the whole of nature, with no need to take into account the kind of thing under investigation. What counts in describing the behavior of a squirrel is not its “squirrelness,” but the forces its limbs exert on one another, the pressure differentials in its circulatory system, and other quantifiable data. This approach makes it possible to have a single method for investigating all natural phenomena.

Leibniz agrees that substantial forms have no use in physics, but he insists metaphysical accounts of reality require something like substantial forms. Mechanical explanation adequately addresses the activity of the physical world, but not its underlying nature. For Leibniz, the corporeal world its very essence depends on incorporeal principles. Both Hobbes’ purely materialist metaphysics and the strict substance-dualism of Descartes fail to properly appreciate nature’s dependence on purely metaphysical entities. Ultimately, Leibniz’s defense of substantial forms provides the first step in the development of his idealist metaphysics.

Leibniz offers several defenses of substantial forms, in which he tries not to revive Aristotle’s notion of form wholesale, so much as to prove the existence of irreducible, incorporeal entities. One argument turns on the principle of sufficient reason: the fact that the corporeal world itself cannot offer any explanation for its particular features. Why does a given body occupy so much space, have a particular shape, or move in just this way? By limiting oneself to mechanical explanation, one can either say that body A’s features were caused by body B, or one can say that body A has had its particular constitution from eternity. The former approach leads to an infinite regress in explanation, which is to say it never arrives at an explanation at all. There is always yet another body requiring explanation. The latter approach, for Leibniz, likewise offers no real explanation. Citing eternity as a reason, he feels, amounts to answering the question “Why is A, x?” with “Simply because A is x and always has been x,” dodging the question. Since the corporeal world does not contain sufficient explanation for its own features, Leibniz concludes that the cause of such features lies in incorporeal principles.

In a second defense of incorporeal substantial principles, Leibniz denies the Cartesian distinction between the primary qualities of bodies and secondary qualities such as color and temperature (DM 12). Descartes, anticipating Locke, argues that the secondary qualities of bodies are relative to the perceiving subject. For instance, as we observe in cases of color-blindness, one person perceives an object as red and another person the same object as green. Color, the argument goes, is thus not a property of the body itself, but depends on the interaction between object and perceiver. Descartes holds, however, that size, shape, and motion are not relative properties, but constitute the essence of body itself. Leibniz, believing that space and time are relative, counters that these primary properties which depend on space and time, and also include something relative to perception. No perceived material quality, therefore, accounts for what a body essentially is. It follows that incorporeal principles must be the real metaphysical building blocks of reality.

A third argument for substantial forms comes in Leibniz’s treatment of force. Descartes had confused force with what we would call momentum. He measured force by multiplying mass by velocity, not by acceleration, or the square of velocity. For Leibniz, this error on the part of Descartes points to an important fact about reality. Motion, measured by mv, is relative. When several objects change positions, one cannot with certainty attribute motion to one object or another. Force, however, has more reality. We have sufficient reason to attribute it to one body over others. In other words, we have more certainty which body in a system is the proximate cause of changes in other bodies. Force, therefore, has more reality than motion, and yet force is not corporeal in the way both mass and velocity are since force is not extended. Though Descartes’ confusion seems simply an error in calculation, in it Leibniz sees additional indication that the realities grounding corporeal objects are not themselves corporeal.

b. Substance as Complete Concept

Though his defense of incorporeal substances allows Leibniz to partially reconcile pre-modern and modern thought, Leibniz still needs to articulate his own account of the nature of these substances. In §8 of the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz takes up the task of defining individual substance. He begins with Aristotle’s definition, which states that when many things are said of a subject, yet it is said of nothing else, this subject is rightly called an individual substance. So, for instance, we say of Alexander the Great that he is Macedonian and ambitious, but we do not say of anything else that it is Alexander the Great. Thus, Alexander is an individual substance.

Leibniz deems this Aristotelian definition of substance merely logical. It tells us something about the structure of thought and language, but does not provide a metaphysical account of substance. To move to a proper metaphysical understanding, Leibniz believes we must look more closely at the nature of predication. “All true predication,” he writes, “has some basis in the nature of things.” Here, Leibniz shows his belief that there is isomorphism between metaphysics and logic. All true propositions have an ontological basis. All we can truly say of Alexander the Great is included in Alexander’s nature.

The idea that each substance includes all the predicates which belong to it is, Leibniz takes it, simply a metaphysical restatement of the predicate-in-notion principle. On the basis of this principle, Leibniz arrives at his notion of substance as a complete concept:

The nature of an individual substance or of a complete being is to have a notion so complete that it is sufficient to contain and to allow us to deduce from it all the predicates of the subject to which the notion is attributed. (DM 8)

Leibniz’s thought is essentially this: if one had a sufficiently powerful intellect, one could deduce from the idea of any individual substance all that could ever be said of it, in just the same way that if one has a clear and distinct idea of a circle, one can deduce all the properties of a circle. From the very concept of Alexander the Great, the infinite intellect of God can deduce all Alexander’s qualities, including that he is the vanquisher of Darius. To be a substance, then, is to have such a corresponding complete concept. Every substance, as it were, includes its biography.

Beginning in the 1690s, “monad” becomes Leibniz’s preferred term for a complete, incorporeal, individual substance. The term monad derives from the Greek mónos, meaning alone or solitary. Leibniz introduces the term to underscore the fact that individual substances are not only complete, but also simple. As Leibniz’s defense of substantial forms showed, the material realm needs grounding in something incorporeal. Matter, however, can be infinitely divided. Leibniz therefore reasons that there must be infinite simple monads populating the world at even the most infinitesimal levels. Leibniz likens the fullness and complexity of the monadic universe to “nested” ponds and gardens.

Each portion of matter can be conceived as a garden full of plants, and as a pond full of fish. But each branch of a plant, each limb of an animal, each drop of its humors, is still another such garden or pond. (M 67)

Monads are thus “spiritual atoms,” the incorporeal building blocks of all reality. They are the complete entities which merit the designation “substance.”

It is in the nature of each monad to have its own internal principle of activity. As Leibniz writes, “activity is of the essence of substance in general” (NE 65). Beginning in the 1690s, Leibniz refers to the internal activity of substances as their primitive active forces. Defining substance in terms of activity is important to Leibniz for several reasons. For one, this position is of a piece with his contention that the activity of corporeal entities is grounded in that of incorporeal entities. In order to play this role, incorporeal monads must themselves be active. More importantly, Leibniz broaches the discussion of substance in the Discourse on Metaphysics with the goal of differentiating the actions of God from those of creatures. In arguing that each substance has its own primitive active force, Leibniz distances himself both from Spinoza’s monism and Malebranche’s occasionalism, the former holding that individual things are not themselves substances but rather modes of a single divine substance, and the latter invoking God’s power to explain the ordinary doings of creatures. To Leibniz, each of these positions insufficiently appreciates that each substance is complete and active in itself. For, were created substances to lack activity, there would be no distinction between actual, created substances and the possible yet uncreated substances in God’s mind, a modal distinction central to Leibniz’s theodicy.

c. Causality and Pre-Established Harmony

If each substance is complete in itself and requires no other substance to be understood, it follows that every finite substance is causally independent of all save God. Each created substance is, as Leibniz says, “like a world apart” (DM 14). But how can this be? How can Alexander defeat Darius without being related to, and thus in a sense dependent on, Darius? More broadly, how can Leibniz square his “world apart” language with our experience of living in a world with a plethora of cause and effect relationships between substances?

Leibniz responds to these questions by offering a unique theory of causal interaction, which he calls at different points either the theory of pre-established harmony or the hypothesis of concomitance. The theory holds that although no two substances directly influence each other, they can express each other, that is, the activity of one can be reflected in the concept of the other. Alexander, we typically say, caused Darius’ death. Leibniz does not object to this kind of causal attribution, but insists that at the metaphysical level, what we call causality amounts to no more than this: it is in the nature of Alexander to be he who defeats Darius and it is likewise in the nature of Darius to be him defeated by Alexander. These two independent substances, as Leibniz puts it, “mirror” each other, so that at the exact moment it can be predicated of Alexander that he is the vanquisher of Darius, it can likewise be predicated of Darius that he is the victim of Alexander.

Hence, although each substance is “like a world apart,” substances form a common world by mirroring, or expressing, one another. God ordains at the moment of creation—in Leibniz’s terms he “preestablishes”—that the perceptions of all creatures in the world harmonize with one another, that there is strict alignment so that at the moment I perceive myself as tapping my friend on the shoulder, she perceives herself as being tapped. Leibniz is fond of likening the relationship between substances to that between two perfectly synchronized clocks which remain aligned despite never touching each other. Causal interaction is no more than what we find in these clocks, the harmonized activity of independent entities. Leibniz famously describes independent monads as “windowless,” neither letting in any outside influence nor issuing any influence (M 7). This is the Leibnizian universe: windowless monads in pre-established harmony.

The theory of pre-established harmony includes the rather strong claim that each substance is harmonized with all other substances in the world. This must be the case if the substances are to form a common world with a common history, since mutual expression is the only possible relation between independent substances. Does this mean that my concept expresses the nature of even a fish living thousands of years ago? In a word, yes. Though Alexander and Darius express each other much more distinctly than I express the ancient fish, my concept must bear traces of the existence of that fish since we are members of a common world. This might seem fantastical, even absurd, but if one considers how much one’s own experience reflects the activities and efforts of one’s predecessors, and how much their activities were constrained by their natural environment, then perhaps one can begin to appreciate Leibniz’s insight that every single substance bears traces of, or faintly expresses, the whole universe, past, present, and future.

Leibniz’s explanation of causality via pre-established harmony and mutual expression has led some commentators to accuse Leibniz of what they call the “mirroring problem.” They object that if substance A expresses the essence of all others, yet these in turn express substance A, then the world is like a hall of mirrors which reflect one another but no concrete images. In this scenario, the concept of any given substance is not complete, as Leibniz would hold, but empty. Although this line of objection points to some of the complexities and potential difficulties in the theory of pre-established harmony, it merits mention that Leibniz sees each substance as fundamentally mirroring God. “It can even be said that every substance bears in some way the character of God’s infinite wisdom and omnipotence and imitates him as much as it is capable” (DM 9). Stating that each substance reflects God’s essence, while also mirroring all other substances, does not directly respond to the mirroring problem. Noting that each substance reflects God’s essence by virtue of its own internal individuating activity perhaps provides a more satisfying response, and it is likely that Leibniz’s solution to the mirroring problem lies in this direction.

d. Idealism

Leibniz’s defense of incorporeal monads as the foundation of the physical world, his notion of substance as a complete concept, and his account of causality via pre-established harmony all contribute to Leibniz’s brand of idealism. By idealism, we mean the thesis that nothing exists in the world but minds and their ideas. As Leibniz summarizes his idealism: “There is nothing in the world but simple substances and in them perception and appetite” (AG 181).

By perception, Leibniz means the “passing state which involves and represents a multitude in the unity or in the simple substance” (M 14). Since each substance is metaphysically complete in itself and “like a world apart,” all changes in its state arise spontaneously, that is, without the intervention of other substances. Yet since each substance mirrors all others, it must contain a multiplicity of representations within itself. The sequence of spontaneous representations is what Leibniz calls perception. Importantly, Leibniz posits that all beings in the world perceive. This is yet another consequence of the fact that mutual representation is the only relation between monads in pre-established harmony. What distinguishes rational, conscious minds from all other substances is not perception, but apperception, or the ability to reflect on their mental processes.

Of appetite, Leibniz writes: “The action of the internal principle which brings about the change or passage from one perception to another can be called appetition; it is true that the appetite cannot always completely reach the whole perception toward which it tends, but it always obtains something of it. And reaches new perceptions” (M 15). The best analogy here is perhaps a mathematical function, where appetite is the analogue to the function equation, or the law of the series, and where each perception represents a discrete value. Leibniz’s point is that each substance has an orientation which defines it and which governs the transition between perceptions. This does not mean that each individual can fully choose or determine the sequence of its perceptions, since it is constrained by the need to faithfully represent the activity of other substances. Appetite does indicate, however, that there is a striving or tendency unique to each substance which shapes the manner in which it reflects the world. Hence Leibniz describes substances as so many distinct “viewpoints” on the universe (DM 14; M 57).

In composite substances, such as living animals whose various parts contribute to the well-being of the entire organism, simple monads unite under the direction of a dominant monad (M 70). Each monad retains its substantial independence, but living organisms display an especially high level of intermonadic harmony. Though Leibniz does not define in detail the operations of dominant monads, these monads must at least subsume others under their own internal principles or appetites. The activity of subordinate monads thereby serves the goals of the dominant monad. Conversely, subordinate monads must have particularly strong bearing on the perceptions of dominant monads, being, as it were, extensions of it. “There is nothing in the world but simple substances, and in them perception and appetite” may sound like a simple statement, but its simplicity should not mask the manifold degrees of coordination between the perceptions and appetites of monads.

e. The Nature of Body

It follows from Leibniz’s idealism that bodies are phenomenal. In other words, the physical world is the perception of perceiving monads. Leibniz is at pains, however, to insist that his system makes bodies “well-founded phenomena” (phenomena bene fundata). By this Leibniz means that bodies are not arbitrary perceptions lacking veracity. The pre-established harmony among all substances establishes a common realm of truth. Our perceptions thus provide us with knowledge of reality and serves as the starting point for empirical science.

Although “well-founded phenomena” might seem an empty expression within an idealist framework, it gains meaning from Leibniz’s commitment to the principle of sufficient reason, that is, the principle that nothing happens without reason or cause. For Leibniz, God’s rational ordering of creation certifies the reliability of sense perception, since God—the most rational of all minds—cannot do anything without having a reason for doing so. It would be arbitrary of God to give me this particular set of perceptions instead of some other set if it were not the case that my perceptions have some basis in other existing substances (NE 56). The thoroughgoing rational design of the world ensures that my perceptions indeed reflect the true order of things.

Defining bodies as “well-founded phenomena” leaves open the question of the relation of an individual’s mind to his own body. After all, my experience of my body seems qualitatively different than my perception of other things in the world. My arm, for example, moves upwards when I wish to remove my hat. Other bodies do not respond to my will in a like manner. Leibniz again invokes his theory of pre-established harmony to explain this apparent interaction between one’s mental and bodily states.

When I wish to raise my arm, it is precisely at the moment when everything is arranged in the body so as to carry this out, in such a manner that the body moves by virtue of its own laws; although it happens through the admirable but unfailing harmony between things that these things conspire towards that end precisely at the moment when the will is inclined to it, since God took it into consideration in advance, when he made his decision about the succession of all things in the universe. (LA 92)

Leibniz explains that God has arranged the world such that one’s mind and body do not directly influence each other, but nevertheless correspond perfectly at all moments. Leibniz is at pains to emphasize that the mind does not directly move the body because he wants to preserve the integrity of physics. Modern physics, relying on the principles of inertia and the conservation of force, requires that the motion of bodies be explained by other bodies. If minds directly influenced bodies, force could be added to the world at any time, and neither the principle of inertia nor the principle of conservation would hold. What causes the motion of my arm are the electrical impulses and synapses of my nervous system. The parallels between our desires and our bodily movements are instances not of interaction, but of harmony.

It is important to note that Leibniz sees the pre-established harmony between mind and body as following from his general theory of substance. Since minds are substantial and bodies phenomenal, my body is in one sense just a particularly distinct perception of my mind. In this sense, one’s perception of one’s body is not qualitatively different from one’s experience of other phenomena. Taking up Leibniz’s description of monads as various “viewpoints” on the universe, perhaps we can liken the body to one’s viewfinder, one’s lens on the universe, so long as we do not take the metaphor too literally by treating the body as an independent substance.

Though Leibniz adopts the language of “well-founded phenomena” to characterize bodies, scholars have debated the extent to which Leibniz’s idealism entails phenomenalism. The debate, put one way, is whether Leibniz makes bodies so “well-founded” that they have more reality than the term phenomena suggests. There is some consensus around the idea that Leibniz does not fully reduce bodies to perceptions, à la Berkeley, since bodies are aggregates of substantially real monads. Less certain is whether the substantial reality of monads makes labeling Leibniz a phenomenalist less apt. Given Leibniz’s insistence that “there is nothing in the world but [incorporeal] simple substances and in them perception and appetite” (AG 181) and his own use of the term phenomena, it seems most likely that Leibniz did not wish to accord bodies of aggregated monads the same metaphysical status as the monads comprising them. In short, monads are substantial, bodies are phenomenal, and Leibnizian idealism entails phenomenalism.

f. Efficient and Final Causality

Leibniz’s retrieval of the notion of substantial form blossomed into his idealist, monadic metaphysics and theory of pre-established harmony. Pre-established harmony mandates that the activity of bodies be explained by other bodies, not by minds. In explaining the activities of bodies, Leibniz makes a second major effort at reconciling ancient and modern thought. He mounts a defense of the utility of final causes in physics.

Aristotle distinguished between four causes, or four ways of accounting for the being of a thing. Philosophers of the 17^th century found particularly objectionable the idea of final cause. The final cause of something indicates its purpose or goal. For instance, one might claim that the final cause of a tree is to grow upwards and reproduce. Thinkers such as Descartes, Hobbes, and Spinoza rejected the utility of final causes in explanations of the physical world, much as they rejected the utility of formal causes, or substantial forms. They restricted physics to the study of efficient causes, mechanical accounts of bodies in motion. We explain the growth of tree by looking to nutrient transfer from roots to branches, the exchange of compounds in respiration, the means of reproduction. To the moderns, any mention of tree’s purpose belongs to poetry, not physics.

Leibniz is as committed to mechanical explanation as his contemporaries, yet he bucks the 17^th century trend of discrediting final causes outright. He reconciles the two approaches by offering a doctrine of double explanation. For Leibniz, events in nature are subject to explanation by either efficient or final causes. Leibniz does not adhere strictly to the Aristotelian notion of final cause any more than he adheres to the Aristotelian notion of substantial form. What Leibniz realizes, however, is that consideration of the end state of a physical process can often have as much predictive power as consideration of the motive forces involved. In §22 of the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz cites Fermat’s proof of the refraction law for light. Fermat derived the law by noting that light takes the easiest path, or the path of least resistance. In this sense, Fermat took note of the end or goal light rays achieve. By contrast, Descartes proved the same law solely by examining efficient causes, likening the refraction of light to bouncing tennis balls, and considering factors such as speed and mass. The refraction of light, Leibniz observes, can be explained and predicted under two separate causal paradigms.

Leibniz’s development of the calculus aids him greatly in his defense of final causes. Using what we would today call the variational calculus, Leibniz can show that change in nature happens at optimal points where the derivative vanishes. Systems thus tend towards certain end states and analyzing these states can furnish us with significant predictive power. Calculus permits Leibniz to tie discussions of final cause to mathematics, not poetics.

Although Leibniz finds both efficient and final causal explanations acceptable, he insists that they be kept separate. We ought not to invoke discussions of purpose simply when we lack a sufficient mechanical explanation. Final causes do not fill the gaps in our understanding of efficient causes; they provide another method of investigation entirely. Leibniz favors explanations by efficient causes, to be sure, as they open up great possibilities for engineering. Still, he considers either method a legitimate account of the world. Efficient causes, Leibniz likes to say, show us God’s power; final causes, by bringing to light the directedness and efficiency of nature, reveal God’s wisdom.

4. Theodicy

a. Leibniz’s Project

Leibniz ranks peace of mind as “the greatest cause of [his] philosophizing” (L 148). Central to Leibniz’s efforts to secure peace of mind is the thesis that we live in the best of all possible worlds, a position now commonly called Leibnizian optimism. Leibniz reasons that if we can assure ourselves that God acts in the best of all possible ways, then we can trust God’s justice and have true peace of mind. Of course, it is by no means self-evident that our world, which includes suffering and evil, is compatible with divine justice, nor is it self-evident what criteria could certify the world as “the best of all possible.” Leibniz thus devotes much argument to defending divine justice and coins the term “theodicy”—from the Greek words for God (theós) and justice (díkē)—to describe this project.

b. God

The thesis that God acts in the best of all possible ways follows from the notion of God as “an absolutely perfect being” (DM 1). Leibniz accepts Descartes’ ontological proof for the existence of God, which proves the existence of God by way of our idea of perfection, with one caveat. To Leibniz, Descartes leaves his proof open to the objection that God does not exist because God cannot exist. “An absolutely perfect being,” this objection posits, is a logical impossibility. So, Leibniz sets out to demonstrate that a single being can possess all perfections in a logically consistent manner. He bolsters the ontological proof by grounding the demonstration for God’s actuality in a demonstration of God’s possibility.

Leibniz clarifies what he means by “perfection” by stipulating that those properties incapable of a highest degree do not qualify as perfections. The “greatest of all numbers” is a contradiction, as is the “greatest of all figures,” since number and magnitude are infinitely continuous quantities. However, there is nothing inherently contradictory in “the highest degree of knowledge” or “the highest degree of power,” so omniscience and omnipotence are rightly considered divine perfections (DM 1). We can say a being possesses limitless knowledge and power without predicating meaningless, impossible attributes of God. Importantly for the purposes of an ontological proof, existence qualifies as perfection under Leibniz’s definition.

Leibniz argues for the compatibility of all perfections by further stipulating that by “perfection” he means a simple, positive quality (L 167). Once we recognize that perfections are simple qualities, Leibniz believes we easily arrive at the conclusion that there is nothing inherently contradictory in the idea of a perfect being. For, were two perfections incompatible, this fact would be evident either immediately or through an analysis of the perfections in question. In the case of perfections like knowledge and power, no immediate incompatibility presents itself. Yet, because these qualities are simple, they cannot be broken down into components which might be shown incompatible. Since the incompatibility of perfections can be shown neither in itself, nor through demonstration, Leibniz concludes that God is a logically possible being. And—following the logic of the ontological proof—if possible, God is necessary.

Leibniz does not disallow other, a posteriori proofs for God’s existence. To the contrary, he employs several such proofs in his writings. Since it turns so much on the idea of perfection, however, his defense of the ontological proof holds a special place in his theodicy and thus in his philosophy as a whole.

c. Possible Worlds and Optimism

As an absolutely perfect being, God acts in the most perfect fashion. To understand what this means for an account of creation and a defense of God’s justice, Leibniz turns to the idea of possible worlds. A possible world is any set of possible substances whose attributes are mutually consistent, or compatible, with one another. Monads whose mutual existence would not entail contradictions are said to be compossible and thus potential members of a common world. God, in his omniscience, surveys an infinite number of compossible sets of substances and chooses to create the optimal, or best possible, world

What characterizes the best possible world? By what criteria does God make his selection? In the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz writes that God selects that world which most effectively balances simplicity of means with richness of effects (DM 5). He likens God to a skilled architect who best employs the space and resources available to him, or a skilled geometer who finds the most elegant solution to a problem. Simplicity of means requires that there be order, efficiency, continuity, and intelligibility in the world. Richness of effects requires the maximization of both metaphysical and moral goodness. Metaphysical goodness denotes the amount of essence or perfection in the world, in short, the extent to which various creatures in the world imitate God’s inexhaustible essence. Maximizing metaphysical goodness therefore requires, at the very least, the creation of a great variety of creatures. Moral goodness refers to the happiness of rational beings, particularly the perfection and advancement of their rational faculties.

Much scholarship is devoted to determining precisely how Leibniz sees richness and simplicity coinciding in the best possible world. The task of interpretation gains complexity from the fact that Leibniz also speaks of God optimizing beauty and harmony, and even at times suggests that the best possible world progresses continually in perfection over time. Despite the difficulties in interpretation, it is clear that at the very least rational beings must inhabit an intelligible world. The perfections of rational beings interfere with one another least and thus are maximally compossible. Rarely does the knowledge and virtue of one person prevent or disallow the knowledge and virtue of another. By contrast, the beauty of a mountain range does preclude the beauty of plains at a given space and time. Because rational beings are capable of knowing God and entering into relationship with him, they are most responsible for maximizing metaphysical and moral goodness in the world. The intelligible order of creation aids them in this by making knowledge of various phenomena accessible through simple hypotheses.

Crucially, the existence of suffering does not count as proof against our world as being the best possible. By Leibniz’s lights, the goodness of the world as a whole does not require that each aspect of the world be choice worthy in itself. Pain and suffering find their place in the best possible world as “necessary evils” in maximizing its overall goodness. Here, the question of God’s justice arises and the true importance of possible worlds for Leibniz’s theodicy comes to light. How can God will to create pain and suffering? Does creating these not compromise divine justice? Leibniz responds that the divine will desires only what is good. The divine intellect takes, as it were, this desire for the good and determines how best to actualize it. The construction of the best possible world is the work of the divine intellect, and no more a matter of God’s will than the solution to an algebra equation depends on my will. God, Leibniz asserts, antecedently wills the good and consequently wills the best. God never wills evils in themselves, and never compromises his perfection, goodness, or justice. He accepts evil and suffering only insofar as they contribute to the overall goodness of the best possible world.

The distinction between what follows from the divine will and what follows from the divine intellect ultimately provides Leibniz with a means of upholding God’s perfection, despite the imperfections of creation. Were the conditions of the optimal world determined not by the divine intellect, but rather by arbitrary fiat, God would be no more than a despot and we would have no objective standard by which to judge his actions best. Were pain and suffering objects of the divine will per se, God would be cruel and unworthy of love. In other words, Leibniz believes he safeguards divine perfection by explaining that God is neither injudicious in thought nor vicious in will in creating the world as it is. Thus, assuring ourselves of God’s goodness and perfection is vital because “one cannot love God without knowing his perfections” (T 54) and loving God provides more happiness and peace of mind than any other activity. “To love is to find pleasure in the happiness of another. We love God himself above all things because the pleasure which we experience in contemplating the most beautiful being of all is greater than any conceivable joy” (L 134).

Leibniz insists that his optimism provides grounds for true joy and peace of mind, not simply the kind of disaffected, “grin and bear it” acquiescence commonly associated with the Stoics and—as Leibniz sees it—championed by Spinoza and Descartes. God does not what he must, but what is best. Whether or not Leibniz offers any greater consolation than the Stoics is an open question. Yet Leibniz believes that even if one cannot see the purpose of suffering, one can gain some measure of joy by contemplating, and advancing in knowledge of, God’s perfection.

Furthermore, because the theory of pre-established harmony among substances requires that all monads be created or destroyed collectively, Leibniz defends the immortality of monads. What we consider “life” is an active state of perception and appetite; what we consider “death” is simply dormancy. Leibniz, not unlike other Christian thinkers before him, maintains the hope that God will compensate for evils suffered by individuals over the full course of their existence, even if the purpose of those evils is not evident during their natural lifespans.

d. Freedom and Necessity

Leibniz’s theodicy raises two weighty sets of questions regarding freedom. The first concerns God’s freedom in creating. If the divine intellect objectively determines the design of the best possible world, should we not conclude that God is determined to create just this world? Is the notion of the divine will not meaningless, compromising the theological concept of grace? The second set of questions concerns human freedom. Since each individual substance contains all that can ever be predicated of it, and since God surveys the activity and interrelations of all monads in selecting the best possible world, it would seem that the entire course of history is set before the creation of the world. Does this mean that the idea of free will—and along with it theological concepts such as sin and redemption—is meaningless?

Leibniz takes these questions seriously throughout his career. His reflections trace at least to his Confession of a Philosopher of 1672-3. Section 13 of 1686’s Discourse on Metaphysics, which explores freedom and necessity, spurs his lengthy correspondence with Antoine Arnauld. And in the Theodicy of 1710, Leibniz calls the “labyrinth of freedom and necessity” one of the most perplexing questions facing humankind.

Though far from the first thinker to confront this “labyrinth,” Leibniz’s original contribution lies in his distinction between two kinds of necessity. Truths whose contraries imply a contradiction Leibniz calls “necessary per se.” Among these truths governed by the principle of non-contradiction, Leibniz includes the laws of arithmetic, geometry, and logic. Because these truths cannot be otherwise, not even to the divine intellect, Leibniz posits that they hold in all possible worlds. He thus refers to propositions necessary per se as “eternal verities.”

Truths which are certain, but whose contrary does not imply contradiction, Leibniz terms “necessary ex hypothesi.” The sequence of events in the world is necessary in this way. It is logically possible to conceive of the world being otherwise than it is. We create fictionalized accounts of reality in novels and dramas all the time; these accounts are entirely consistent in themselves. Because events in the world can be imagined otherwise, Leibniz believes they are in themselves contingent (contingent per se). Nevertheless, events in the world necessarily happen as they do on the presumption of (ex hypothesi) God’s selection of the best possible world. While the created world could be otherwise than it is, the optimal world could not be. Truths necessary ex hypothesi are governed by the principle of sufficient reason: God has a reason, a cause for creating the world in this way, namely, his desire for the best.

Leibniz locates a second method of distinguishing truths necessary per se from truths contingent per se in their respective manners of demonstration. The truth of a claim necessary per se, Leibniz writes, can be demonstrated a priori in a finite analysis, a proof with a finite number of steps. Think of Euclid’s demonstrations of the principles of geometry. Proving the truth of a contingent proposition, by contrast, requires an infinite analysis. To explain a priori why a given proposition about the world is true, one would have to take into account its harmony with all the other substances in the world, as well as account for why this set of substances was chosen out of the infinite number of possible worlds. Explanation would literally proceed ad infinitum. This is not to say that contingent truths are unknowable. God’s infinite intellect can presumably handle an infinite analysis and we know contingent truths a posteriori through experience. Infinitude of an analysis is a formal property of certain demonstrations, one Leibniz thinks suffices to distinguish necessary ex hypothesi from necessary per se truths.

With the distinction between the two kinds of necessity, Leibniz attempts to maintain meaningful notions of both divine and human freedom. Since God has infinitely many options among possible worlds, he cannot be said to be required in creating. One might object that God’s benevolent nature constrains and determines his action by forcing God to select the best world his intellect can design. Leibniz, however, counters that acting in accord with one’s nature and for the sake of the best is true freedom. One is only determined when constrained by outside forces. That God’s own nature leads him to create the best from among possible worlds makes him all the more free and worthy of praise.

Whether Leibniz is licensed to speak of human freedom is a thornier issue. Kant, in his Critique of Practical Reason, famously scoffs that Leibniz grants human beings nothing more than “the freedom of a turnspit” which, “once it is wound up, also accomplishes its movements of itself” (I.3; 5:97). Kant reasons that Leibniz’s monads, like any good machine, simply execute what they are programmed to do. To an extent, Kant is right. Leibniz does not entertain a notion of “free will,” if by this one means arbitrary and completely undetermined choice. The principle of sufficient reason banishes arbitrary choice. Human beings act in accord with their own natures, choosing what they deem best. My individual essence provides the reason for what I do

Yet while rejecting a voluntarist conception of free will, Leibniz nevertheless speaks of human freedom. We might reconstruct Leibniz’s reasoning in three steps. First, with the modal distinction between the two kinds of necessity, Leibniz insists that human choices are not necessary in the strong sense. Each truth about monads and their history is logically contingent. Leibniz, therefore, is not a logical determinist. He is however, an ontological determinist, insofar as all events are necessary given the composition of the world. Nevertheless—and this is the second step—the fact that each substance is causally independent of all other created substances makes each monad spontaneous. Spontaneity, to reiterate, refers to the fact that each state of a created substance follows from its preceding state without the direct influence of other substances; in this sense, each substance is “free.” Still, spontaneity is not what most people mean by human freedom. Human freedom—step three—comes with the fact that rational beings can gain knowledge of the causal principles governing the sequence of events in the world. Acting with knowledge does not make one less determined, but does make one less passive. One feels less at the mercy of inalterable forces when one understands these forces and can appreciate the principles of God’s design. The idea that increased activity and knowledge make an individual free owes much more to the conception of freedom developed by the Stoics and revived in the 17^th century by Spinoza than it owes to voluntarist and Protestant conceptions of free will. As Leibniz sees it, his is the only conception of freedom compatible with divine perfection and worldly optimism.

5. Epistemology

a. Ideas and Knowledge

Leibniz’s epistemology begins with the distinction between clear and obscure ideas. An idea is clear when it allows one to recognize the thing represented, obscure when it does not. For example, one may have seen a gerbil and thus have an idea of what a gerbil is. However, if the next time she encounters a small rodent she cannot tell whether it is a gerbil or a hamster, then she possesses only an obscure idea of “gerbil.” By contrast, when one’s idea suffices to reliably distinguish one kind of object from others, then the idea is clear.

Leibniz divides clear ideas into two classes: confused and distinct. A clear idea is also distinct when one can catalogue all the marks, or criteria, distinguishing that idea from others. The animal physiologist can differentiate and enumerate those characteristics common to all rodents and those unique to gerbils. A child with a pet gerbil might not be able to do so and thus would have a clear but confused idea. Leibniz believes our sensory ideas, such as those of color, are clear and confused. Though we reliably distinguish blue from red, we cannot necessarily spell out the marks or causes which make one object blue and another red. We perceive colors without explaining them.

Leibniz proceeds to further classify clear and distinct ideas as either adequate or inadequate. If possessing an adequate idea, one has clear and distinct knowledge not only of the idea in question, but also of all its component parts. One has clear and distinct knowledge “all the way down” to the primitive concepts which compose the idea. Leibniz admits that he is unsure if any human being possesses an adequate idea, but believes our arithmetical knowledge most nearly approaches adequacy. In all other cases, where one cannot carry out comprehensive analyses down to primitive concepts, one has clear, distinct, yet inadequate ideas.

At its highest reaches, knowledge is not only adequate, but also intuitive. Intuitive knowledge is both adequate and non-discursive. That is, one clearly and distinctly knows all the ingredients of an idea and grasps these simultaneously. As is the case with all adequate knowledge, intuitive knowledge seems more suited to divine knowers than to human knowers, as the latter cannot think about all the components of a complex concept at once.

One consequence of Leibniz’s taxonomy of knowledge is that it provides Leibniz with a means of explaining sense perception. Given Leibniz’s idealism, all that exists in the world are monads and their mental states. Bodies are phenomenal and therefore not sources of knowledge. What, then, is sense perception? Is there any real difference between sensation and intellection if all ideas follow spontaneously from a monad’s own concept, with no interaction between monads? Leibniz answers such questions by noting that what we commonly experience as sense perceptions are simply confused ideas. Even if they are clear, sense perceptions are necessarily confused. Though these perceptions arise spontaneously in the perceiving subject, they express the harmony between a given monad and all others; it is therefore impossible to enumerate all the contributing factors to any given sense perception, most of which fall below the threshold of consciousness (DM 33). With the category of clear and confused ideas, Leibniz can meaningfully retain the distinction between sensation and intellection without compromising the basic tenets of his idealism.

Leibniz’s approach to ideas and knowledge separates him in some key respects from his fellow 17^th century rationalists. The division between distinctness and adequacy leads Leibniz to differentiate between nominal and real definitions. Nominal definitions include distinct knowledge; they sufficiently identify the defining marks of a concept. Yet they do not ensure that the concept is possible. It could be that a concept is internally inconsistent, a fact which would be revealed if one had adequate knowledge of all its parts. Real definitions account for the possibility of a thing, either by citing experience or through a priori demonstration. In his discussion of definition, Leibniz seeks to modify Hobbes’ strong nominalism in which all truth is dependent on the relationship between names and definitions. There is a higher level of knowledge than that contained in nominal definitions, one which accounts for possible existence in reality.

Hobbes is not Leibniz’s only rationalist target. Leibniz believes he improves upon Descartes’ maxim that all clearly and distinctly perceived ideas are true by delineating better criteria for clarity and distinctness. To Leibniz, Descartes construes clarity and distinctness as something like immediately perceived qualities, ripe for misevaluation.

b. Innate Ideas

In the New Essays on Human Understanding, Leibniz takes aim at Locke’s depiction of the mind as a tabula rasa, or blank tablet, needing external impressions to furnish it with the contents of its reasoning. In opposition to this conception of the mind and cognition, Leibniz affirms the existence of innate ideas. In one sense, Leibniz’s theory of substance obviously commits him to some conception of innate ideas. If monads have no “windows” through which they interact with other substances, then of course all their ideas must have an internal, innate origin.

But Leibniz does not rest his defense of innate ideas on his theory of substance. Rather, he advances fairly traditional epistemological arguments regarding the nature of deductive, a priori truths. Empirical knowledge can show that something is the case but cannot show that something is necessarily the case. The human mind, however, has knowledge of necessary truths, such as the laws of arithmetic and geometry. These necessary truths, which Leibniz calls “truths of reason,” are ideas whose opposite is impossible. They are the eternal truths which obtain in all possible worlds. Because truths of reason are known solely through the principle of non-contradiction and require no empirical data, Leibniz concludes that they are innate to the mind. Leibniz contrasts innate ideas with “truths of fact,” contingent truths whose opposite is possible and knowledge of which requires experience.

The theory of innate ideas does not imply that all minds have equal awareness of the truths of reason. Ideas are innate in us not as actualities, but “as inclinations, dispositions, tendencies, or natural potentialities” (NE 52). Accessing truths of reason requires effort. Yet the presence of innate ideas does incline us towards their discovery. In one particularly apt metaphor, Leibniz claims that rational minds are not like blank tablets, but like veined pieces of marble, disposed to be cut and polished in determinate ways.

c. Petites Perceptions

One of the more original elements of Leibniz’s epistemology is his theory of petites perceptions.

There are hundreds of indications leading us to conclude that at every moment there is in us an infinity of perceptions, unaccompanied by awareness or reflection; that is, of alterations in the soul itself, of which we are unaware because these impressions are either too minute and too numerous, or else too unvarying, so that they are not sufficiently distinctive on their own. But when they are combined with others they do nevertheless have their effect and make themselves felt, at least confusedly, within the whole. (NE 53)

Leibniz posits that at any given time, the mind has not only the thoughts of which it is aware, but also innumerable small, insensible perceptions, which he calls petites perceptions.

Leibniz wagers that there are “hundreds of indications” pointing to existence of petites perceptions. Regardless of whether this is hyperbole, there are at least a few good reasons Leibniz includes these perceptions in his theory. For one, petites perceptions follow from the theory of pre-established harmony, both the harmony between all substances and the harmony between mind and body. Each monad mirrors the activity of all others at all moments. This mirroring takes place via mutual representation. Since no mind, at any given moment, has conscious awareness of all other substances, mutual representation must be taking place at insensible levels via petites perceptions. Moreover, the pre-established harmony between mind and body requires that mental activity express and run parallel to bodily activity. However, one is often insensitive to one’s bodily processes. In order to maintain the perfect parallelism between body and mind, therefore, we must conclude that the mind has petites perceptions of the body’s activity.

Even more fundamentally, the existence of petites perceptions follows from Leibniz’s understanding of substance. It is of a piece with the thesis that “there is nothing in the world but simple substances and in them perception and appetite.” Activity, more specifically perception, is the mark of any substance. That the mind has petites perceptions explains how it remains active and substantial even in dreamless sleep or after death.

Petites perceptions also help to explain the workings of appetite. Appetite determines the transition from one perception to the next, a transition which oftentimes seems sudden and episodic. For instance, one might jump immediately from thinking of one’s mother to thinking of Beethoven’s fifth symphony. On its face, this transition violates the principle of continuity, which states that no discontinuous change occurs. Nature—including rational nature—makes no leaps, has no gaps. The theory of petites perceptions accounts for apparent leaps in perception. What appears a discontinuous change in thought is actually determined by the continuous workings and interactions of infinitely many insensible perceptions.

Finally, petites perceptions help to explain what is confused in a confused idea, particularly in sense perceptions. The difficulty in explaining all the marks of a sensation comes from the many petites perceptions which contribute to it. “These minute perceptions…constitute that je ne sais quoi, those flavors, those images of sensible qualities, vivid in the aggregate but confused as to the parts; those impressions which are made on us by the bodies around us and which involve the infinite; that connection each of us has with the rest of the universe” (NE 54-5).

d. Reflection, Memory, Selfhood

All substances are incorporeal and perceptive. For this reason, Leibniz understands all substances on analogy to human minds or souls. Leibniz reserves the proper use of the term “soul,” however, for higher order substances with particular cognitive capacities. Souls not only perceive, but also apperceive. That is, they not only perceive objects, but also think about and reflect on themselves. They have the added capacity to remember past perceptions. These abilities to reflect and remember provide souls with a sense of self, an understanding of the “I.” As a result, souls have moral identities. Moral identity goes beyond the substantial identity over time that all monads have; moral identity requires that one can remember his past actions, recognize himself as the selfsame individual over time, and therefore assume responsibility for his character.

Reflection and memory make souls not just moral beings, but intellectual beings as well. Leibniz observes that self-reflection serves as the starting point for all metaphysical and philosophical thinking. Each soul is, as it were, its own principal innate idea. Studying one’s own nature leads one to form and investigate fundamental metaphysical ideas. “In thinking of ourselves, we think of being, of substance, of the simple and the composite, of the immaterial, and of God himself, by conceiving that that which is limited in us is limitless in him. And these reflective acts furnish the principle objects of our reasonings” (M 30).

Because of their moral and intellectual capacities, Leibniz likens souls to “little divinities” (M 30). Leibniz expresses the near divinity of rationality rather poignantly in the Theodicy:

This portion of reason which we possess is a gift of God and consists in the natural light that has remained with us in the midst of corruption; thus it is in accordance with the whole, and it differs from that which is in God only as a drop of water differs from the ocean, or rather as the finite from the infinite. (T 169)

Though every substance reflects God and his plan for the cosmos, rational souls are mirrors of God in a heightened way, being able to understand the nature of things, reflect on God’s works, and ultimately enter into relationship with him (M 83-84).

6. Ethics

Of the traditional major content areas of philosophy, ethics is perhaps the only one to which Leibniz is generally not considered to have made significant contribution. Certainly he does not share the reputation as an ethicist enjoyed by early modern thinkers Spinoza, Hume, and Kant, nor does he share the influence in political philosophy had by Locke and Hobbes. Leibniz himself, however, took great interest in the ethical dimensions of his thought. He engaged in central debates of the day regarding the foundations of justice and the possibility of altruistic love. Furthermore, all his thinking has a clear ethical bent, with the peace of mind sought by his optimism a prime example of this. While Leibniz’s ethical contributions do not match his metaphysics in scope or originality, when it comes to a thinker as singular as Leibniz, this fact alone should not discourage inquiry into his ethics.

a. Intellect and Will

Leibniz’s approach to ethics is, broadly speaking, intellectualist in nature. That is, Leibniz sees moral goodness as increasing in line with knowledge. He defines will as “the inclination to do something in proportion to the good it contains” (T 139). Hence, the more knowledge one has of the goodness of a particular object or act, the better one’s will is directed. Loving and desiring the right kinds of things follows from proper understanding. Perfecting the intellect, in short, accomplishes the perfection of the will.

Perfecting the intellect also brings about happiness. “It is obvious,” Leibniz writes, “that the happiness of mankind consists in two things—to have the power, as far as permitted, to do what it wills and to know what, from the nature of things, ought to be willed. Of these, mankind has almost achieved the former; as to the latter, it has failed in that it is particularly impotent with respect to itself” (L130). Despite Leibniz’s dour diagnosis of humanity’s understanding of perfection, his prognosis is encouraging. He does not see happiness as particularly difficult to achieve. One need only pursue and acquire knowledge of the nature of things.

The close alliance Leibniz sees between intellect and will has the further consequence of ruling out indifference of equipoise, a topic of much debate in the 17^th century At issue in discussions of this “indifference” is the question of whether one’s will can be in complete suspension when faced with two or more options, without inclination one way or another. The purported phenomenon of indifference of equipoise was taken at the time as evidence of the will’s independence from the intellect and even of its capacity for free, uncaused choice.

Leibniz rejects indifference of equipoise on grounds of the principle of sufficient reason. Uncaused events are incomprehensible; all events, including acts of the will, have some explanation. Here the deeper significance of Leibniz’s account of the will comes to light: one’s knowledge of the goodness of things provides the reason the will chooses as it does. Still, one might ask, could not the will be in equilibrium when faced with two objects of equal goodness? No. Per the principle of the identity of indiscernibles, each substance in the world has a unique complete concept which mirrors God and creation in a unique way; no two substances, no two states of affairs, are equivalent in goodness. One’s intellect and will therefore cannot respond identically to two different options. Though we may sometimes feel completely indifferent and unable to articulate the reasons for a choice, Leibniz insists that it would be a mistake to think of the choice as uncaused or of the will as uninclined. Infinitely many petites perceptions are at work in one’s mind at all times; much like machines, our movements are the result of all the tendencies and inclinations within us, even those of which we are unaware. Thus, we should not champion arbitrary choice by citing indifference of equipoise, but rather become freer, more self-aware moral beings through progress in knowledge.

b. Justice and Charity

Leibniz sees the study of justice as an a priori science of the good. There is, that is, an objective, rational basis for justice. Though Leibniz wrote much regarding the positive laws of states, he does not see positive law as the foundation of justice. He rejects the position that justice has no firmer foundation than the fiat of those in power, a position Leibniz often mentions in conjunction with Thrasymachus from Plato’s Republic but more pointedly associates with Samuel von Pufendorf and Thomas Hobbes. Taken to its logical conclusion, this position results in divine command theory: certain principles are just simply because God, the most powerful of all legislators, has posited they be so. For Leibniz, this line of thinking violates God’s perfection. God acts in the most perfect way and thus acts with good reason, not by arbitrary fiat. He is perfect not only in power, but also in wisdom. God’s perfect will follows upon his perfect intellect no less than the will of any rational being follows upon her intellect. The a priori, eternal standard of justice to which God himself adheres provides the basis for a theory of natural law.

Leibniz defines justice as the charity of the wise person. Though this may seem unique, or even odd, to those accustomed to seeing justice and charity contrasted, what is truly original in Leibniz’s rooting justice in charity is his very definition of charity, or love. In the 17^th C., there were a series of debates regarding the possibility of disinterested love. Each creature, it would seem, acts to preserve and advance its own being. Hobbes and Spinoza employed the term conatus to refer to the striving each being has to persist in its own being and made it the foundation of their respective psychologies. On this view, one loves what one finds pleasing, that is, what one finds conducive to his own persistence. Love is reduced to a kind of egoism which, even where benevolent, nevertheless lacks an altruistic component.

Leibniz attempts to obviate the tension between egoism and altruism by defining love as taking pleasure in the happiness, or perfection, of another. With this definition, Leibniz does not deny the fundamental drive all creatures have for pleasure and self-interest, but ties it to altruistic concern for the well-being of others. The coincidence of altruism and self-interest defines love and captures the essence of justice. Justice is the charity of the wise person and the wise person, Leibniz goes on to say, loves all. Leibniz’s basic contention is that to be just is to show the love attended by insight that God shows. Ethics involves seeking the good of all in a prudent way, such that the good of each individual is pursued only insofar as it is compatible with the whole. One cannot love all when obtaining the happiness of one person at the expense of another’s, nor would this be desirable, since Leibniz believes we find more pleasure in harmony than discord. The kind of universal love demanded by Leibniz’s definition of justice is nurtured by reflection on the universal harmony between all things. Leibniz believes that appreciating the harmonious order of the cosmos can lead individuals to find pleasure in increasing the perfection and happiness of all who share in that order.

Leibniz’s definition of love also entails that loving God is the highest end of rational beings. If love is finding pleasure in the perfection of another, then loving an infinitely perfect being affords the greatest possible pleasure and happiness.

To love is to find pleasure in the happiness of another. We love God himself above all things because the pleasure which we experience in contemplating the most beautiful being of all is greater than any conceivable joy. (L 134)

Since the harmony of the world mirrors God’s perfection, Leibniz’s conception of justice does not place love of God at odds with love of others. We should take pleasure in perfection wherever we discern it. Justice as the charity of the wise person means that love of God and love of neighbor are one. By identifying justice with love of God and harmony between all, Leibniz brings to fruition the ethical implications of his metaphysical inquiries into God’s perfection and pre-established harmony. Ethics and metaphysics are, for Leibniz, never far apart.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources: Leibniz Texts and Translations

The standard critical edition of Leibniz’s writings is G.W. Leibniz: Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, edited by the Deutsche Akademie der Wissenschaften (Berlin: Academy Verlag, 1923- ). The Akademie edition is still in production. Other useful editions of Leibniz’s writings in their original languages are those of C. I. Gerhardt (Die Philosophischen Schriften von Leibniz. 7 vols. 1875-1890) and Ludovici Dutens (Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz: Opera Omnia. Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag, 1989).

References in this article to Leibniz’s works use the following abbreviations and translations:

AG G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Edited and translated by Roger Ariew and Daniel Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.

DM Discourse on Metaphysics, as translated by Ariew and Garber in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Passages from the Discourse are cited by section number.

G Die Philosophischen Schriften von Leibniz. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin. 7 vols. 1875-1890.

L G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Papers and Letters. Edited and translated by Leroy E. Loemker. 2nd ed. Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989.

LA The Leibniz-Arnauld Correspondence. Edited by H.T. Mason. Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1967.

M Monadology, as translated by Ariew and Garber in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Passages from the Monadology are cited by section number.

NE New Essays on Human Understanding. Edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.

T Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man, and the Problem of Evil. Translated by E.M. Huggard. BiblioBazaar, 2007.

Other helpful collections of Leibniz’s writings in English include:

The Leibniz-Clarke Correspondence. Edited by H.G. Alexander. New York: Philosophical Library, 1956.
The Labyrinth of the Continuum: Writings on the Continuum Problem, 1672-1686. Edited by Richard W. T. Arthur. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2002.
The Leibniz-Des Bosses Correspondence. Edited by Brandon C. Look and Donald Rutherford. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2007.
Leibniz: Logical Papers. Edited by G.H.R. Parkinson. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1966.
De Summa Rerum: Metaphysical Papers, 1675-1676. Edited by G.H.R. Parkinson. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1992.
Leibniz: Political Writings. Edited by Patrick Riley. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
Confessio Philosophi: Papers Concerning the Problem of Evil, 1671-1678. Edited by Robert C. Sleigh, Jr. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2005.
Leibniz and the Two Sophies: The Philosophical Correspondence. Edited by Lloyd Strickland. Toronto: Iter, Inc., 2011.
Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts. Edited by R.S. Woolhouse and Richard Francks. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1997.

b. Secondary Sources

i. Introductory Texts

Antognazza, Maria Rosa. Leibniz: An Intellectual Biography. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
Arthur, Richard T.W. Leibniz. Cambridge: Polity Press, 2014.
Jolley, Nicholas. Leibniz. New York: Routledge, 2005.
Perkins, Franklin. Leibniz: A Guide for the Perplexed. New York: Continuum, 2007.
Savile, Anthony. Routledge Guidebook to Leibniz and the Monadology.New York: Routledge, 2000.

ii. More Advanced Studies

Adams, Robert Merrihew. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. New York: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Garber, Daniel. Leibniz: Body, Substance, Monad. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
Ishiguro, Hidé. Leibniz’s Philosophy of Logic and Language. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1975.
Mercer, Christia. Leibniz’s Metaphysics: Its Origins and Development. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Parkinson, G.H.R. Logic and Reality in Leibniz’s Metaphysics. Cambridge: Oxford University Press, 1965.
Rescher. Nicholas. Leibniz’s Metaphysics of Nature. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1981.
Riley, Patrick. Leibniz’s Universal Jurisprudence: Justice as the Charity of the Wise. Harvard University Press, 1996.
Rutherford, Donald. Leibniz and the Rational Order of Nature. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Sleigh, Robert C. Leibniz and Arnauld: A Commentary on their Correspondence. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1990.
Smith, Justin E.H. Divine Machines: Leibniz and the Sciences of Life. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2011.
Strickland, Lloyd. Leibniz Reinterpreted. London: Continuum, 2006.
Wilson, Catherine. Leibniz’s Metaphysics: A Historical and Comparative Study. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1989.

iii. Collected Essays

Brown, Stuart, ed. The Young Leibniz and his Philosophy (1646-76). Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1999.
Jorgensen and Newlands, eds. New Essays on Leibniz’s Theodicy. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2014.
Jolley, Nicholas, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz. edited by Nicholas Jolley. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Rutherford and Cover, eds. Leibniz: Nature and Freedom. New York: Oxford University Press, 2005.

Author Information

Edward W. Glowienka
Email: eglowienka@carroll.edu
Carroll College
U. S. A.

Resource Bounded Agents

Resource bounded agents are persons who have information processing limitations. All persons and other cognitive agents who have bodies are such that their sensory transducers (such as their eyes and ears) have limited resolution and discriminatory ability; their information processing speed and power is bounded by some threshold; and their memory and recall is imperfect in some way. While these general facts are not controversial, it is controversial whether and to what degree these facts should shape philosophical theorizing.

Arguably, resource bounded agents pose the most serious philosophical challenges to normative theories in a number of domains, and especially to theories of rationality and moral action. If a normative theory endorses a standard for how an agent ought act or think, or if a normative theory aims to provide recommendations for various kinds of conduct, such a theory will have commitments regarding the descriptive facts about the agent’s cognitive limitations. There are two major responses. These theories may either (1) argue to dismiss these descriptive facts as irrelevant to the normative enterprise (see section 2) or, instead, (2) attempt to accommodate these facts in some way (see section 3). Historically, normative theories that have attempted to accommodate facts about cognitive limitations have done so by either (i) augmenting the proposed normative standard, or (ii) using facts about cognitive limitations to show that agents cannot meet the proposed normative standard.

After a brief discussion of some empirical work addressing human cognitive limitations, this article will discuss idealization in philosophy and the status of the normative bridge principle “ought implies can,” which suggests that “oughts” are constrained by descriptive limitations of the agent. Next, the article explores several theories of rationality that have attempted to accommodate facts about cognitive limitations.

As an introductory and motivating example, consider the claim that human agents ought not to believe inconsistent propositions. Initially, such a claim seems perfectly reasonable. Perhaps this is because a collection of inconsistent propositions is guaranteed to include at least one false proposition. But Christopher Cherniak (1986) has pointed out that when one has as few as 140 (logically independent) beliefs, there are approximately 1.4 tredecillion (a number with 43 digits) pairs of beliefs to check for potential inconsistency. No human could ever check that many items for consistency. In fact, an ultra-fast supercomputer would take 20 billion years to complete such a task. Hence, for some epistemologists, the empirical fact of the impossibility of a complete consistency-check of a human’s belief corpus has provided reason for thinking that complete consistency of belief is not an appropriate normative standard. Whether such a response is ultimately correct, however, concerns the status of resource bounded agents in normative theorizing.

Cognitive Limitations and Resource Bounds
Idealization
Accommodating Cognitive Limitations
1. Changing the Normative Standard
2. Failing to Meet the Standard
  1. Kahneman and Tversky’s “Heuristics and Biases” Program
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Further Reading

1. Cognitive Limitations and Resource Bounds

Every known cognitive agent has resource and cognitive limitations. Christopher Cherniak refers to this necessary condition as the “finitary predicament”: because agents are embodied, localized, and operate in physical environments, they necessarily face informational limitations. While philosophers have acknowledged this general fact, the precise details of these resource and cognitive limitations are not widely discussed, and the precise details could matter to normative theorizing. Revisiting the example from above, it is obvious that humans cannot check 1.4 tredecillion pairs of beliefs for consistency. But it is not obvious how many beliefs a human agent can check. If it could be experimentally demonstrated that humans could not occurrently check twelve beliefs for consistency, even this minimal consistency check might not be rationally required. Hence, the precise details of cognitive limitations need to be addressed.

Before turning to the details of cognitive limitations, it is important to note that there are two senses of the term ‘limitation’. To see the distinction, consider a simple example. Very young children are limited in their running abilities. This limitation can be described in two ways: (i) young children cannot run a mile in under four minutes, and (ii) young children are not excellent runners. The important difference in these (true) descriptions is that way (i) uses non-normative language and way (ii) uses normative language. This distinction is crucial when the main objective is an evaluation of the normative standard itself. For instance, challenging whether (i) is true involves non-normative considerations while challenging whether (ii) is true fundamentally involves normative considerations. As such, the kinds of cognitive limitation under discussion in this article will primarily concern non-normative limitations.

In what follows, this article will survey some findings from cognitive psychology to illustrate various attempts to measure human cognitive limitations. These findings are not exhaustive and should be thought of as representative examples.

a. Limitations of Memory

Memory is the general process of retaining, accessing, and using stored information. Short-term memory is the process of storing small amounts of information for short periods of time. In 1956 George Miller published a paper that helped measure the limitations of human short-term memory. This paper was an early example of the field that would later be known as cognitive psychology. In “The Magical Number Seven, Plus or Minus Two”, Miller argued that short-term memory is limited to approximately seven items (plus or minus two). That is, Miller argued that for typical adult humans, short-term memory is bounded by about nine items. Later work such as Cowan (2001) has suggested that the capacity of short-term memory might be smaller than previously thought, perhaps as small as four items.

In some ways, Miller’s result should be puzzling. Humans are often able to recite long sentences immediately after reading them, so how would this ability square with Miller’s experimental results? Miller also introduced the idea of “chunking” in his famous 1956 paper. To “chunk” items is to group them together as a unit (often by a measure of similarity or meaningfulness). This is an information compression strategy. For example, suppose the task is to remember the following eight words: catching, dog, apples, city, red, frisbees, park, yellow. Likely, this would be somewhat difficult. Instead, suppose the task was to remember the four phrases: yellow dog, red apples, catching frisbees, city park. This should be less difficult, even though the task still involves eight words. The explanation is that the eight items have been “chunked” down to four informational items (to be “uncompressed” later when needed). Yet, the existence of chunking strategies does not mean that short-term memory is unbounded. Typical humans cannot remember more than seven (plus or minus two) chunks, nor is it the case that just any string of information can be chunked. For many subjects, it would be exceedingly difficult to chunk the following eight strings of letters: rucw, mxzq, exef, cfiw, uhss, xohj, mnwf, ofhn.

Long-term memory is the process of storing information for long periods of time. Long-term memory also features kinds of limitation. It may be tempting to think that stored memories are like photographs or video, which may be retrieved and then reviewed as an unaltered representation of an event. But this is not how human memory works. Psychologists have known for a long time that many aspects of memory are “constructive”. That is, factors such as expectation, experience, and background knowledge can alter memories. Humans are prone to omit details of events and even add details that never occurred. Consider the classic example of Bartlett’s “War of the Ghosts” experiment. In 1932 Fredrick Bartlett read British subjects a story from aboriginal Canadian folklore. He then asked the subjects to recall the story as accurately as they were able. This established a baseline of subject performance. Next, Bartlett used the experimental technique of “repeated reproduction” and had subjects retell the story after longer and longer periods of time. Bartlett found that as more time passed, subjects’ retelling of the story became shorter and more and more details were omitted. As well, many subjects added details to the story that reflected their own culture, rather than the cultural setting of the story. As one example, instead of recalling the canoes that were mentioned in the story, many subjects retold the story as concerning boats, which would be more familiar to a British participant.

It has also been demonstrated that for some kinds of information, retrieving an item from memory can reduce the likelihood of successfully retrieving a competing or related item. As a simple example, trying to remember where one last put one’s keys would be much more difficult if competing memories such as where one put the keys two days ago or three days ago were just as likely to be recalled. Instead, it appears as though there is an inhibitory mechanism that suppresses the recall of competing memories (in this case, the older “key location” memory). While potentially beneficial in some respects, this “retrieval-induced forgetting” effect might be harmful in some academic settings. Macrae and MacLeod (1999) gave subjects 20 “facts” about a fictional island. Next, subjects were evenly divided into two groups: group one practiced memorizing only a select 10 of the 20 facts and group two did not practice memorizing any of the 20 facts. Unsurprisingly, group one had better recall than group two on the select 10 facts. But, interestingly, group two had better recall than group one on the other 10 facts. That is, by attempting to memorize some subset of the 20 facts, group one had impoverished recall in the unpracticed subset of facts. This result might have implications for students that attempt to cram for an exam: in cramming for an exam, students may reduce their performance on unstudied material.

In addition to the above limitations, humans also suffer from age related performance decreases in memory. Humans also typically have difficulty in remembering the source of their information (that is, how they initially learned the information). Further, misinformation and suggestion can alter subjects’ memories and even create “false memories”. Eyewitness reports of a crime scene may omit relevant information when a gun is present (known as “weapon focus”), due to the narrow attentional focus on the gun. As well, subtle feedback to an eyewitness report (for example, a police officer says “thanks for helping identify the perpetrator”) can strengthen the eyewitness’ feeling of confidence, but not their reliability.

b. Limitations of Visual Perception

Humans are able to visually detect wavelengths between roughly 400 and 700 nanometers, corresponding to colors from violet to red. Hence, unaided human vision cannot detect much of the information in the electromagnetic spectrum, including infrared and ultraviolet radiation. Under ideal conditions, humans can discriminate between wavelengths in the visible spectrum that differ by only a few nanometers.

It is a mistake to think that, for humans, the entire visual field is uniformly detailed. This is surprising, because it seems (phenomenologically, at least) that most of the visual field is detail rich. Recall the experience of studying the brushstrokes of an artwork at approximately five feet of distance. The uncritical experience suggests that vision always provides highly detailed information—perhaps this is because everywhere one looks there appears to be detail. Yet, there is a sense in which this is an illusion. In the human eye, the fovea is responsible for providing highly detailed information, but the fovea is only a small part of the retina. Eye movements, called saccades, change the location of foveal vision to areas of interest, so details can be extracted where they are wanted. Much of the visual field in humans does not provide detail rich information, and might be described in lay terms as being similar to “peripheral vision”. This non-foveal part of the visual field has limited acuity and results in impoverished perceptual discriminatory ability.

Just as it is incorrect to think that memory works like a photograph, human color vision does not simply provide the color of an object in the way a “color picker” does in a image editing computer program. The color an object appears is often highly sensitive to the amount of light in the environment. Color judgments in humans can be highly unreliable in low light environments, such as when distinguishing green from purple. Human vision is also subject to color constancy in some circumstances. Color constancy occurs when objects appear to stay the same color despite changing conditions of illumination (which change the wavelengths of light that are reflected) or because of their proximity to other objects. For instance, the green leaves of a tree may appear to stay the same color as the sun is setting. Color constancy may be helpful for the tracking or re-identification of an object through changing conditions of illumination, but it may also increase the unreliability of color judgments.

c. Limitations of Attentional Resources

Attention is the capacity to focus on a specific object, stimulus, or location. Many occurrent cognitive processes require attentional resources. Lavie (1995, 2005) has proposed a model that helps explain the relationship between the difficulty of various tasks and the ability to successfully deploy attentional resources. Lavie’s idea is that total cognitive resources are finite, and difficult cognitive tasks take up more of these resources. A direct implication is that comparatively easier tasks allow for available cognitive resources to process “task-irrelevant” information. Processing task-irrelevant information can be distracting and even reduce task performance. For an example of this phenomenon, consider the difference between taking an important final exam and casually reading at a coffee shop. Applying Lavie’s model, taking an important final exam will often use all of one’s cognitive resources, and hence, no task-irrelevant information (such as the shuffling of papers in the room or the occasional cough) will be processed. In this particular instance, the task-irrelevant stimuli cannot be distracting. In contrast, causally reading at a coffee shop typically is not a “high-load” task and does not require most of a subject’s cognitive resources. While reading casually one can still overhear a neighboring conversation or the sound of the espresso machine, sometimes hindering the ability to concentrate on one’s book.

As an example of competition from task-irrelevant stimuli, consider the well-known Stroop effect. First conducted by J.R. Stroop in 1935, the task is to name as quickly as possible the color of ink used to print a series of words. For words such as ‘dog’, ‘chair’ and ‘house’, each printed in a different color, the task is relatively easy. But Stroop had subjects read words such as ‘green’, ‘blue’, and ‘red’ printed in non-representative colors (so ‘red’ might be printed in blue ink). This version of the task is much more challenging, often taking twice as much time as the version without color words. One explanation of this result is that the task-irrelevant information of the color word is difficult to ignore, perhaps because linguistic processing of words is often automatic.

Attentional resources are also deployed in tracking objects in the environment. Object-based attention concerns representing and tracking objects. Xu et al. (2009) report that due to limits on processing resources, the visual system is able to individuate and track about four objects. Sears and Pylyshyn (2000) also cite limits on the capacity to process visual information and have shown that subjects are able to track about five identical objects in a field of ten objects.

2. Idealization

This section will discuss one dismissive response to problems posed by resource bounded agents. The basic idea behind this response is that descriptive facts about cognitive limitations are irrelevant to the normative enterprise.

a. Idealization Strategies

In drafting various normative theories (concerning, for example, rational belief or moral action), some philosophers have claimed to be characterizing “ideal” agents, rather than “real” or “non-ideal” agents like humans (where real or non-ideal agents are those agents that have cognitive limitations). This strategy can be defended on a number of lines, but one defense appeals to theory construction in the physical sciences. In drafting physical theories it is often helpful to first begin with theoretically simple constraints and add in complicating factors later. For instance, many introductory models about forces omit mention of complicating factors such as friction, air resistance, and gravity. Likewise, a philosopher might claim that the proper initial subject of normative theorizing is the ideal agent. As such, descriptive details of the cognitive limitations of non-ideal agents are simply not relevant to initial theorizing about normative standards, because ideal agents do not have cognitive limitations. Yet, the thought is, theories of ideal agents might still be useful for evaluating non-ideal agents. Continuing with the analogy with scientific models, the proposed strategy would be to first determine the normative standard for ideal agents, and then evaluate non-ideal human agents as attempting to approximate this standard.

As one example of this strategy, return to the issue of believing inconsistent propositions. Because ideal agents do not have memory or computational limitations, these agents are able to check any number of beliefs for inconsistency. It then seems that these agents ought not to believe inconsistent propositions. Perhaps the reason for this is that one ought not to believe false propositions, and a set of inconsistent propositions is guaranteed to have at least one false member. This result might serve as one dimension of the normative standard. Now, turning attention to resource bounded agents such as humans, it might be thought that these agents ought to try to approximate this standard, however imperfectly. That is, the best reasoners imaginable will not believe inconsistent propositions, so humans ought to try to approximate the attitudes or behaviors of these reasoners. On this view, better human reasoners believe fewer inconsistent propositions.

A second defense of the idealization strategy appeals directly to the kinds of concepts addressed by normative theories. Many normative concepts appear to admit of degrees. It might be thought that there can be better and worse moral decisions and better and worse epistemic attitudes (given a collection of evidence). If this is correct then, plausibly, ideal agents might be thought to be the best kind of agent and correspondingly the proper subject for normative theorizing. Consider the following example. Suppose a person witnesses an unsupervised child fall off a pier into a lake. In a real case, the human observer might feel paralyzing stress or anxiety about the proper response and thus momentarily postpone helping the child. Such a response may seem less than optimal—it would be better if the agent responded immediately. Considering these optimal responses might necessarily involve imagining ideal agents, because (plausibly) every real agent will have some amount of stress or anxiety. Because ideal agents do not have psychological limitations, an ideal agent would not become paralyzed by stress or anxiety and would respond immediately to the crisis. In this regard, after abstracting away from complicating factors arising from human psychology, ideal agents might help reveal better moral responses.

As briefly mentioned above, idealization strategies often offer a bridge principle, linking the proposed normative standard to real human action and judgment. Of course, human agents are not ideal agents, so how do ideal normative standards apply to real human agents? One common answer is that human agents ought to try to approximate the ideal standards, and better agents more closely approximate these standards. For instance, it is clear that no human agent could achieve a pairwise check of all of their beliefs for logical consistency. But it still might be the case that better agents check more of their beliefs for consistency. Plausibly, young children check few of their beliefs for consistency whereas reflective adults are careful to survey more of the claims they endorse for consistency and coherence. On this measure it is not obviously unreasonable to judge the reflective adult as more rational than the young child.

b. Problems with the Idealization Strategy

One potential problem with the idealization strategy is the threat of incoherence. If every cognitive agent is physically embodied, then every cognitive agent will face some kinds of resource limitation. Hence, it is unclear that ideal agents are either physically possible or even conceivable. What kind of agents are ideal cognizers anyway? Do ideal cognizers even reason or make inferences, given the immediate availability of their information? Should we really think of them as reasoners or agents at all? Ideal cognizers are certainly unlike any cognitive agent with which we’ve ever had any experience. As such, the thought is that little weight should be placed on claims such as “ideal agents are able to check any number of beliefs for inconsistency”, because it is not clear such agents are understandable.

An idealization theorist might respond by leaning on the analogy with model construction in the physical sciences. Introductory models of forces that omit friction, say, may describe or represent physically impossible scenarios but these models nonetheless help reveal actual structural relationships between force, mass, and acceleration (for instance). Perhaps, so too for normative theorizing about ideal agents.

A second potential problem with the idealization strategy concerns possible disanalogies between theorizing in philosophy and the physical sciences. Introductory models of forces in the physical sciences do not yield ultimate conclusions. That is, the general relationship between force and mass that is established in idealized models is later refined and improved upon with the addition of realistic assumptions. These updated models are thought to be superior, at least with respect to accuracy. In contrast, however, many philosophers who claim to be theorizing about ideal agents take their results to be either final or ultimate. As previously mentioned, some epistemologists take belief consistency to be a normative ideal, and adding realistic assumptions to the model does not produce normatively better results. If such a stance is taken, then this weakens the analogy with theory construction in the physical sciences.

A third potential problem with the idealization strategy is that it is not clear that there are unique ideal agents or even unique idealized normative standards. Why should we think that there is one unique ideally rational agent or one unique ideally moral agent, rather than a continuum of better agents (perhaps just as there is no possible fastest ideal marathon runner)? The worry is clear in this respect: if there are only better and better agents (with no terminally best agent) then the study of any particular idealized agent cannot yield ultimate normative standards. It is also not clear that there are always unique idealized normative standards. For instance, it is often assumed that there are optimal decisions or optimal plans for ideal agents to choose. Yet, John Pollock (2006) has argued that there is “no way to define optimality so that it is reasonable to expect there to be optimal plans”. The consequence of this result, if it can be maintained, is that there is no unique optimal plan or set of plans that an ideal agent could choose. Hence, an idealization strategy, one that abstracts away from time and resource constraints on the agent, could not represent ideal plans. It is more controversial as to whether there are optimal belief states that ideal reasoners would converge to, given unbounded time and unbounded cognitive resources.

c. Ought Implies Can

A fourth potential problem with the idealization strategy concerns the well-known and controversial “ought implies can” principle. If true, this principle states that the abilities of the agent constrain normative demands or requirements on the agent. Consider an example from the moral domain. Suppose that, after an accident, a ten ton truck has pinned Abe to the ground and is causing him great harm. Ought a fellow onlooker, Beth, lift the truck and free Abe? Many would claim that because Beth is unable to lift the truck, she has no duty or obligation to lift the truck. In other words, it might seem reasonable to think that Beth must be able to lift the truck for it to be true that she ought to lift the truck. There may well be other things that Beth ought to do in this situation (perhaps make a phone call or comfort Abe), but the idea is that these are all things that Beth could possibly do.

If “ought implies can” principles are true in various normative domains such as ethics or epistemology, then the corresponding idealization strategy would face the following problem. Idealization strategies, by definition, abstract away from the actual abilities of agents (including facts about memory, reasoning, perception, and so forth). Hence, these strategies will not produce normative conclusions that are sensitive to the actual abilities of agents, as “ought implies can” principles require. Hence, idealization strategies are defective.

Said differently, “ought implies can” principles suggest that descriptive facts matter to normative theorizing. As Paul Thagard (1982) has said, epistemic principles “should not demand of a reasoner inferential performance which exceeds the general psychological abilities of human beings”. Of course, idealization strategies necessarily disagree with this claim. If “ought implies can” principles are true then we have reason to reject idealization strategies.

Are “ought implies can” principles true? Intuitively, the Abe and Beth case above seems plausible and reasonable. This provides prima facie evidence that there is something correct about a corresponding moral “ought implies can” principle in the moral domain. However, in epistemology, there are reasons to think that “epistemic oughts” do not always imply “epistemic cans”.

In defending evidentialism, Richard Feldman and Earl Conee (1985) have argued that cognitive limits do not always constrain theories of epistemic justification. As they say, “some standards are met only by going beyond normal human limits”. Feldman and Conee give three examples. The first concerns a human agent whose doxastic attitude a best fits her evidence e, but forming a is beyond the agent’s “normal cognitive limits”. To fill in the details, suppose that the doxastic attitude that best fits Belinda’s evidence is believing that her son is guilty of the crime, but also suppose that Belinda is psychologically unable to appropriately assess her evidence (given its disturbing content). Feldman and Conee think that the intuitive response to such a case would be to think that (believing in guilt) “would still be the attitude justified by the person’s evidence”, even though in this case Belinda faces the impossible task of assessing her evidence. Indeed, it seems that this is a standard response one might have toward family members of guilty defendants: given the evidence, they ought to believe that their loved one is guilty, despite its impossibility. If such a response is correct, then “ought implies can” principles are not always true in epistemic domains.

The second and third examples Feldman and Conee give are the following:

Standards that some teachers set for an “A” in a course are unattainable for most students. There are standards of artistic excellence that no one can meet, or at least standards that normal people cannot meet in any available circumstance.

These latter examples are surely weaker than the first. It would be completely unreasonable for a teacher to adopt a standard for an “A” that was impossible for any student to satisfy (“to get an “A” a student must show that 0 = 1″). However, part of the difficulty here is that the relevant notion of “can” is either vague or ambiguous. Does “can” mean some students could satisfy the standard some times? Or does “can” mean that at least one student could satisfy the standard once? It would not be unreasonable for a teacher to adopt a standard for an “A” that one particular class of students could not attain. The art example is even more difficult. First, the art example is unlike the Abe pinned under the truck example. In that case it was physically impossible for Beth to lift the truck. The art example, however, contains a standard that “normal people cannot meet in any available circumstance”, with the implication that some humans can meet the standard. The difference between these examples is that one is indexed to Beth’s abilities and the other is indexed to human artistic abilities, generally. The worry is that some standards might be “community standards” and hence the relevant counterexample would be a case where no one in the community could meet the standard. Indeed, it would be an odd artistic standard such that no possible human could ever satisfy it.

Lastly, it is unclear whether Feldman and Conee’s remarks can be generalized to other normative domains. Even if Feldman and Conee are correct in thinking that various “epistemic oughts” do not imply “epistemic cans”, it is not obvious whether similar considerations hold in the domain of morality or rational action.

3. Accommodating Cognitive Limitations

The second major kind of response to resource bounded agents is to accommodate the descriptive facts of cognitive limitations into one’s normative theory. Proponents of this response claim that facts about cognitive limitations matter for normative theories. To continue with the example of believing inconsistent propositions, a theorist that adopted a version of this response might attempt to argue that resource bounded agents ought not to believe “feasibly reached” or, instead, “obvious” inconsistent propositions. This response would accommodate facts about cognitive limitations by relaxing the standard “never believe any set of inconsistent propositions”.

There are two ways in which one might attempt to accommodate cognitive limitations into one’s normative theorizing. First, similar to the above example, one might “change the normative standard” and argue that resource bounded agents show that normative standards should be relaxed in some way. Versions of this response will be discussed in section 3a. Second, one might instead argue that cognitive limitations show that the agents being investigated cannot meet the proposed normative standard, and hence, are inherently defective in some dimension. This response will be discussed in section 3b.

a. Changing the Normative Standard

In this subsection, the article discusses several prominent views that accommodate descriptive facts about cognitive limitations by augmenting or changing normative standards.

i. Simon’s “Satisficing View” of Decision Making

One way to accommodate the cognitive limitations that agents face is to relax the traditional normative standards. In the domain of rational decision making, Herbert Simon (1955, 1956) replaced the traditional “optimization” view of the rationality of action with the more relaxed “satisficing” view. To illustrate the difference between optimization procedures and satisficing procedures, consider the well-known “apartment finding problem”. Presumably, when searching for an apartment one values several attributes (perhaps cost, size, distance from work, quiet neighborhood, and so forth). How ought one choose? The optimization procedure recommends maximizing some measure. For example, one way to proceed would be to list every available apartment, assess each apartment’s total subjective value under the various attributes, determine the likelihoods of obtaining each apartment, and then calculate this “weighted average” and choose the apartment that optimizes or maximizes this measure. Simon noticed that such an optimization procedure is typically not feasible for humans: it is too computationally demanding. For one, the complete information about apartment availability or even complete information about apartment attributes is often unavailable. Secondly, the relevant probabilities are crucial to an optimization strategy, but these probabilities are too cognitively demanding for typical human agents. For example, what is the probability that apartment B will still be available if the initial offer for apartment A gets rejected? How would one calculate this probability? Instead, Simon suggests that humans ought to make decisions by “satisficing”, or deciding to act when some threshold representing a “good enough”, but not necessarily best or optimal, outcome is achieved. To satisfice in the apartment finding problem, one determines some appropriate threshold or aspiration level of acceptability (representing “good enough”), and then one searches for an apartment until this threshold is reached. A satisficer picks the first apartment that surpasses this threshold.

It is important to note that, under a common interpretation, Simon is not recommending the satisficing procedure as a next best alternative to the optimization procedure. Instead, Simon is suggesting that the satisficing procedure is the standard by which to judge rational action. Correspondingly, human agents who do not optimize in the sense described above are not normatively defective qua rational decision maker.

One claimed advantage of satisficing over optimization concerns computational costs. A satisficing strategy is thought to be less computationally intensive than an optimization strategy. Optimization strategies require the computation of “expected values” based on a network of probabilities and subjective values, and also the computational resources to store and compare these values. Satisficing strategies, by contrast, only require that an agent is able to compare a possible choice with a threshold value, and there is no need to store past assessments (other than the fact that a past choice was assessed). A second advantage of satisficing is that it seems to come close to describing how humans actually solve many decision problems and, as well, appears to be predictively successful. For better or worse, humans do seem to pick apartments, cars, perhaps even mates that are “good enough” rather than optimal (and note that someone like Simon would say this is “for the better”).

Two criticisms of satisficing concern its stability over time and the setting of satisficing thresholds or aspiration levels. A benefit of the optimization procedure is that an agent can be confident that her decision is the best in a robust sense—in comparison with any other alternative, the optimal option will be superior to this alternative. However, if one picks option a under a satisficing procedure, one cannot be confident that option a will be superior to any other future alternative option b. In fact, one cannot be confident that the next alternative option is not better than the current option. This is potentially problematic in the following sense. If one sets one’s satisficing threshold too low, one may quickly find a choice that surpasses this threshold, but is nonetheless unacceptable in a more robust sense. For example, buying the first car one sees on the sales lot is often not recommended, however easy this strategy is to follow. In this example the threshold for “good enough” is clearly too low. This leads to the second broad criticism. When factoring in the calculation needed to determine how low or high to set the satisficing threshold, it is not obvious whether satisficing procedures retain their computational advantage. As previously mentioned, a satisficing threshold that recommends buying the first car one sees on the sales lot is too low. But what threshold should count as representing a “good enough” car? In most cases this is a difficult question. Intuitively, a “good enough” car is one that has some or many desirable features. But is this a probabilistic measure—must these desirable features be known to obtain with the choice selection or are they merely judged to be probable? Further, how does one compute the relationship between some particular feature of the car and its desirability? The worry is that setting appropriate satisficing thresholds is as difficult as optimizing. Serious concern with these kinds of issues puts pressure on the claim that satisficing procedures have clear computational advantages.

ii. Pollock’s “Locally Global” View of Planning

John Pollock is also critical of optimization strategies for theories of rational decision making, for reasons concerning cognitive limitations. However, rather than focus on the rationality of individual decision problems (such as the apartment finding problem or the car buying problem mentioned above), Pollock’s view concerns rational planning. To see the difference between individual decision problems and planning problems, consider the following example. In deciding what to do with one’s afternoon, one might decide to go to the bank and go to the grocery store. By deciding, one has solved an individual decision problem. However, there are two important issues that are still unresolved for the decision: (1) how to implement the decisions “go to the bank” and “go to the grocery store” (go by car or by bus or walk?) and (2) how to structure the order of individual decisions (go to the bank first, then go to the grocery store second?). Planning generally concerns the implementation and ordering issues illustrated in both (1) and (2). When agents engage in planning they attempt to determine what things to do, how to do them, and how to order them.

Planning is often regarded as more broad than the field of “decision theory”, which typically focuses on the rationality of individual actions. Research in artificial intelligence concerning action almost exclusively focuses on planning. One reason for this focus is that many AI researches want to build agents that operate in the world, and operating in the world requires more than just deciding whether to perform some particular action. As illustrated above, there are often many ways to perform the same action (one may “go to the bank” by traveling by car or by boat or by jet pack). As well, actions are performed in temporal sequence with other actions, some of which potentially conflict (for example, if the bank closes at 4pm, then it is impossible to go to the bank after one goes to the grocery store).

Now, how ought rational agents to plan? One suggestion is that rational agents choose optimal plans, in a way similar to the optimization procedure mentioned in section 3ai above. An optimal plan is a plan that maximizes some measure (such as expected utility, for example). A simple version of a plan-based optimization procedure might include the following: (i) survey all possible plans and (ii) choose the plan that maximizes expected utility. Many of the claimed virtues for the optimization procedure of individual decisions discussed in section 3ai above also count as virtues of the plan-based optimization procedure.

John Pollock has argued that real, non-ideal agents ought not use plan-based optimization procedures. Part of his argument shares reasons given by Herbert Simon: resource bounded agents such as humans cannot survey and manage the information required to optimize. Further, Pollock responds to this situation in a similar way to Simon. Rather than claim that informational resource limitations show that humans are irrational, Pollock argues that the correct normative standard is actually less demanding and can be satisfied by human agents.

One feature of Pollock’s argument is similar to Christopher Cherniak’s (1986) observation about the inherent informational complexity of a complete consistency check on one’s belief corpus. Pollock argues that because plans are constructed by adding parts or “sub-plans”, the resulting complexity is such that it is almost always impossible to survey the set of possible plans. For example, suppose an agent considers what plan to adopt for the upcoming week. In a week, an agent might easily make over 300 individual decisions, and a plan will specify which decision to implement at each time. Further, suppose that there are only 2 alternative options for each individual decision. This entails that there are 2^300 possible plans for the week to consider, or, approximately 10^90 plans, a number greater than the estimated number of elementary particles in the universe. Obviously, human agents cannot survey or even construct or represent the set of possible plans for a week of decisions. Actually, the situation is much worse. Rational planning includes what things to do, how to do them, and how to order them, and additionally what may be called “contingency plans”. One might adopt a plan to drive to the airport on Sunday, but this plan might also include the contingency plan “if the car won’t start, call a taxi”. Optimization procedures would require selecting the maximally best contingency plans for a given plan (it would typically not be recommended to try to swim to the airport if one’s car won’t start), but additionally surveying and constructing the set of all possible contingency plans only furthers the computational complexity problem with the optimization procedure.

Instead of optimization, Pollock argues that non-ideal human agents should engage in “locally global” planning. Locally global planning involves beginning with a “good enough” master plan (an idea Pollock acknowledges is reminiscent of Simon’s satisficing view), but continually looking for and making small improvements to the master plan. As Pollock claims, “the only way resource bounded agents can efficiently construct and improve upon master plans reflecting the complexity of the real world is by constructing or modifying them incrementally”. The idea is that resource bounded agents ought to defeasibly adopt a master plan which is “good enough”, but continually seek improvements as new information is obtained or new reasoning is conducted.

iii. Cherniak’s “Minimal Rationality” and “Feasible Inferences”

Chistopher Cherniak’s (1986) Minimal Rationality is a seminal work in the study of resource bounded agents, and it discusses the general issue of the relationship between cognitive limitations and normative standards. He begins by arguing against both idealized standards of rationality (“finitary” agents such as humans could never satisfy these conditions) and a “no standards” view of rationality (unlike agents we recognize, such agents would never generate any predictions on their behavior). The third alternative, that of “minimal rationality” suggests “moderation in all things, including rationality”. Cherniak claims that many of the minimal rationality conditions can be derived from the following principle:

(MR) If A has a particular belief-desire set, A would undertake some, but not necessarily all, of those actions that are apparently appropriate.

For example, Cherniak is clear in suggesting that rational agents need not eliminate all inconsistent beliefs. This generates the following “minimal consistency condition”:

(MC) If A has a particular belief-desire set, then if any inconsistencies arose in the belief set, A would sometimes eliminate some of them.

In support of (MC), Cherniak argues that non-minimal, ideal views of rationality (ones that suggest agents ought to eliminate all inconsistencies) would actually entail that humans are irrational. As he claims, “there are often epistemically more desirable activities for [human agents] than maintaining perfect consistency”. The idea is that given the various cognitive limitations that humans face (the “finitary predicament”), it would be irrational for any human to attempt to satisfy the Sisyphean task of maintaining a consistent belief corpus.

There are two prominent objections to Cherniak’s minimal consistency condition. First, as Daniel Dennett and Donald Davidson have pointed out in various works, it is difficult to understand or ascribe any beliefs to agents that have inconsistent beliefs. For instance, suppose that Albert believes that p, and that p entails q, but also suppose that Albert believes that q is false. What is Albert’s view of the world? In one sense, it may be argued that Albert has no view of the world (and hence no beliefs) because, ultimately, Albert might be interpreted as believing both q and ¬q, and there is no possible world that could satisfy such conditions. In response, Cherniak invokes an “ought implies can” principle. He suggests that once an agent meets a threshold of minimal rationality, “the fact that a person’s actions fall short of ideal rationality need not make them in any way less intelligible to us”. As such, Cherniak’s response could be understood in a commonsense way: typical human agents have some inconsistent beliefs, but we nonetheless ascribe beliefs to them.

A second objection to Cherniak’s minimal consistency condition concerns the permissiveness of the condition. As Appiah (1990) has worried, “are we left with constraints that are sufficiently rich to characterize agency at all”? As an example, an agent that eliminates a few inconsistent beliefs only on Tuesdays would satisfy (MC). Yet there is something intuitively defective about such a reasoner. Instead, it seems that what is wanted is a set of constraints on reasoners, reasoning, and agency that are more strict and more demanding than Cherniak’s minimal rationality conditions. Perhaps anticipating objections similar to Appiah’s, Cherniak developed what he calls a theory of “feasible inferences”. A theory of feasible inferences recruits descriptive facts about cognitive limitations to provide more restrictive normative requirements. For instance, a theory of “human memory structure” describes what information is cognitively available to human agents, given various background conditions. In general terms, when information is cognitively available to an agent, more normative constraints are placed on the agent. Correspondingly, conditions such as (MC) would thereby be strengthened.

However, it is unclear whether a theory of human memory structure will provide enough detail to propose a “rich structure of constraints” on rationality or agency. For one, Cherniak’s theory of human memory structure describes typical humans. There is even a sense in which “typical human” is an idealized notion since no individual is a typical human. Given that there are individual differences in memory abilities between humans, which constraints should be adopted? If an inference to q is obvious for Alice but it would not be obvious for a typical human, is Alice required to believe q (on pain of irrationality) or is it merely permissible for her to believe q? Note that proponents of idealization strategies (as discussed in section 2) are able to provide a rich structure of constraints and do not have to worry about individual differences in cognitive performance.

iv. Gigerenzer’s “Ecological Rationality”

Gerd Gigerenzer views rationality as fundamentally involving considerations of the agent’s environment and the agent’s cognitive limitations. Similar to many of the theorists discussed above, Gigerenzer also cites Herbert Simon as an influence. Many aspects of Gigerenzer’s view may be understood as responding to the influential project of psychologist Daniel Kahneman, to which this article will turn next.

Gigerenzer (2006) is clear in his rejection of “optimization” views of rationality, which he sometimes calls “unbounded rationality”. As he claims,

. . . it is time to rethink the norms, such as the ideal of omniscience. The normative challenge is that real humans do not need. . . unlimited computational power.

In place of optimization procedures, Gigerenzer argues that resource bounded agents ought to use “heuristics” which are computationally inexpensive and are tailored to the environment and abilities of the agent (and are, hence, “fast and frugal”). Rationality, for Gigerenzer, consists in the deployment of numerous, however disparate, fast and frugal heuristics that “work” in an environment.

To understand Gigerenzer’s view, it is helpful to consider several of his proposed heuristics. For the first example, consider the question of who will win the next Wimbledon tennis championship. One way to answer this question, perhaps in line with the optimality view of rationality, would be to collect vast amounts of player performance data and make statistical predictions. Surely, such a strategy is computationally intensive. Instead, Gigerenzer suggests that in some cases it would be rational to use the following heuristic:

Recognition Heuristic: If you recognize one player but not the other, then infer that the recognized player will win the particular Wimbledon match.

First, the recognition heuristic is obviously computationally cheap—it does not require informational search or deep database calculations, or the storage of large amounts of data. Second, the recognition heuristic is incredibly fast to deploy. Third, this heuristic is not applicable in all environments. Some agents will not be able to use this heuristic because they do not recognize any tennis player, and some agents will not be able to use this heuristic because they recognize every tennis player. Fourth, it is essential to note that proper use of the recognition heuristic, in Gigerenzer’s view, results in a normatively sanctioned belief or judgment. That is, when agents use the recognition heuristic in the appropriate environment, the resulting belief is rational. For instance, if Mary only recognizes Roger Federer in the upcoming match between Federer and Rafael Nadal, then it is rational for her to believe that Federer will win.

Some may find this last result surprising or counterintuitive—after all, Mary may know very little about tennis, so how can she have a rational belief that a particular player will win? Gigerenzer would reply that such surprise or counterintuitiveness probably results from holding an optimality view of rationality. Gigerenzer’s project is an attempt to argue that rationality does not consist in gathering large amounts of information and making predictions on this basis. Rather, Gigerenzer thinks that rationality consists in using limited amounts of information in efficient or strategic ways, with the caveat that the proper notion of efficiency and strategy are not idealized notions, but concern the agent’s cognitive limitations and environment.

Now turn to the important question: does the recognition heuristic work? Gigerenzer (2007) found that in approximately 70% of Wimbledon matches, the recognition heuristic predicted the winning player. That is, for agents that are “partially ignorant” about tennis (those that know something about tennis but are not experts) the recognition heuristic gives better-than-chance predictive success.

Consider another heuristic. Humans need to track objects in the environment such as potential threats and sources of food. One way to track an object would be to calculate its trajectory using properties of force, mass, velocity and a series of differential equations. Some AI systems attempt to do just this. It is clear that humans do not explicitly solve differential equations to track objects, but it is also not obvious that humans do this even at a subconscious or automatic level. Gigerenzer (2007) proposes that humans use a “gaze heuristic” in specific situations. For example, consider the problem of tracking an oncoming plane while flying an airplane. One way to infer where an approaching plane will be is to use a series of mathematical formulae involving trajectories and time. A second way would be to use the following gaze heuristic:

Gaze Heuristic: Find a scratch or mark in your airplane windshield. If the other plane does not move relative to this mark, dive away immediately.

As with the recognition heuristic, the gaze heuristic is computationally cheap and fast. Further, this heuristic is not liable to induce calculation errors (as may be the case with the mathematical equations strategy).

Gigerenzer has also argued that a version of the gaze heuristic is used by outfielders when attempting to catch fly balls. This heuristic consists of the following instructions: fix your gaze on the ball, start running, and adjust your running speed so that the image of the ball rises at a constant rate. Interestingly, Shaffer et al. (2004) attached a small camera to dogs when they were fetching thrown frisbees, and it appears that dogs may too use the gaze heuristic. If so, a plausible explanation seems fitting with Gigerenzer’s proposal: in the face of resource limitations, many agents use inference strategies that are fast and frugal, and work in their environment.

One initial worry for Gigerenzer’s project of finding fast and frugal heuristics is that it is not clear there are enough heuristics to explain humans’ general rationality. If a non-expert correctly infers that an American will hit the most aces during Wimbledon, was this an inference based on the recognition heuristic (it is not obvious that it must be), or is there an additional heuristic that is used (perhaps a new heuristic that only concerns aces hit in a tennis match)? Gigerenzer is clear in his rejection of “abstract” or “content-blind” norms of reasoning that are general purpose reasoning strategies, but his alternative view may be forced to posit a vast number of heuristics to explain humans’ general rationality. Further, a cognitive system that is able to correctly deploy and track a vast number of heuristics does not obviously have a clear computational advantage.

A second worry concerns the “brittleness” of the proposed heuristics. For instance, referencing the above mentioned recognition heuristic, what ought one to infer in the case of a tennis match where the recognized player becomes injured on court? Of course, the recognition heuristic is not adaptable enough to handle this additional information (with the idea being that injured players, however excellent, are typically unlikely to win). So, there may be instances in which it is rational to override the use of a heuristic. But positing a cognitive system that monitors relevant additional information and judges whether and when to override the use of a specific heuristic might erase much of the alleged computational advantages that heuristics seem to provide.

b. Failing to Meet the Standard

This article will now address the remaining response by theorists to accommodate the facts of cognitive limitations into their normative theorizing. Some philosophers and psychologists have used facts about cognitive limitations to argue that humans fail to meet various normative standards. For instance, one might argue that humans’ inherent memory limitations and corresponding inability to check beliefs for logical consistency entail that humans are systematically irrational. One might argue that humans’ inherent inability to survey all relevant information in a domain entails that all humans are systematically deluded in that domain. Or, concerning morality, one might attempt to argue that cognitive limitations entail that humans must be systematically immoral, because no human could ever make the required utility calculations (of course, under the assumption of a particular consequentialist moral theory).

Though all of the example positions in the above paragraph are somewhat simplistic, they all roughly share the following features: (i) the claim of a somewhat idealized or “difficult to obtain” normative standard and (ii) the claim that facts about cognitive limitations are relevant to the normative enterprise and show that agents cannot meet this normative standard. As a quick review of material covered in previous sections, theorists such as Herbert Simon, John Pollock, Christopher Cherniak, and Gerd Gigerenzer would reject feature (i), because, in very general terms, they have argued that cognitive limitations provide reason for thinking that the relevant normative standards are not idealized and are not “difficult to obtain”. Proponents of the idealization strategy, such as many Bayesians in epistemology, would reject (ii), because they view the cognitive limitations of particular cognitive agents as irrelevant to the normative enterprise.

i. Kahneman and Tversky’s “Heuristics and Biases” Program

Daniel Kahneman and Amos Tversky are responsible for one of the most influential research programs in cognitive psychology. Their basic view is that human agents reason and make judgments by using cognitive heuristics, and that these heuristics produce errors. Hence the label “heuristics and biases”. Though Kahneman and Tversky have taken a nuanced position regarding the overall rationality of humans, others such as Piatelli-Palmarini (1994) have argued that work done in the heuristics and biases program shows that humans are systematically irrational.

Before discussing some of Kahneman and Tversky’s findings, it is important to note two things. First, though both Gigerenzer and Kahneman and Tversky use the name “heuristics”, these theorists plausibly mean to describe different mechanisms. For Gigerenzer, reasoning heuristics are content-specific and are typically tied to a particular environment. For Kahneman and Tversky, heuristics are understood more broadly as a “shortcut” procedure for reasoning or as a reasoning strategy that excludes some kinds of information. Notoriously, Gigerenzer is critical of Kahneman and Tversky’s characterization of heuristics, claiming that their notion is too vague to be useful. Second, Gigerenzer and Kahneman and Tversky evaluate heuristics differently. For Gigerenzer, heuristics are normatively good (in situations where they are “ecologically rational”), and they are an essential component of rationality. Kahneman and Tversky, however, typically view heuristics as normatively suspect since they likely lead to error.

To begin, consider Kahneman and Tversky’s heuristic of “representativeness”. As they say, “representativeness is an assessment of the degree of correspondence between a sample and a population, an instance and a category, an act and an actor or, more generally, between an outcome and a model”. By using the representativeness heuristic, for one example, a subject might infer that a typical summer day is warm and sunny because it is a common and frequent event, and hence, representative.

Kahneman and Tversky claim that the representativeness heuristic drives some proportion of human probability judgments. They also claim that the use of this heuristic for probability judgments leads to systematic error. In one experiment Tversky and Kahneman (1983) gave subjects the following description of a person and then asked them a probability question about this description. This is the well-known “Linda the bank teller” description: “Linda is 31 years old, single, outspoken and very bright. She majored in philosophy. As a student, she was deeply concerned with issues of discrimination and social justice, and also participated in anti-nuclear demonstrations”. Next, Kahneman and Tversky asked subjects which of the two statements was more probable (given the truth of above description): (T) Linda is a bank teller, or (T&F) Linda is a bank teller and is active in the feminist movement. Kahneman and Tversky report that approximately 85% of subjects judge (T&F) as more probable than (T). Before discussing the alleged incorrectness of this judgement, why might subjects make this judgment? The thought is that, given the description of Linda being an activist in social justice movements and perhaps a philosophy major, (T&F) is more representative of Linda than (T). If Kahneman and Tversky are right in thinking that representativeness drives judgment about probabilities, then their model could explain the result of the Linda case.

But ought agents to judge that (T&F) is more probable than (T), given the description of Linda? This is the important normative question. Kahneman and Tversky rely on the probability calculus as providing the normative standard. According to many versions of the probability calculus, prob(a) ≥ prob(a&b), regardless of the chosen a or b. This may be called “the conjunction rule” for probabilities. The basic idea is that a narrower or smaller class of objects is never more probable than a larger class, and that the overlap of two classes cannot be larger than one of the individual classes. For example, which class is larger, the class of all trucks (Tr) or the class of all white trucks (W&Tr)? Clearly, the answer is the class of all trucks, because every white truck is also a truck. So, which is more probable, that there is a truck parked in front of the White House right now (Tr) or that there is a white truck parked in front of the White House right now (W&Tr)? Plausibly, it is more likely that there is a truck parked in front of the White House (Tr), because any white truck is also a truck, and hence would also count toward the likelihood of there being a truck parked there.

Kahneman and Tversky appeal to the probability calculus as providing the normatively correct rule of reasoning for the Linda case. Because 85% of subjects responded that (T&F) was more probable than (T), against the conjunction rule, Kahneman and Tversky claim that most subjects made an incorrect judgment. So, on their view, this is a case where resource limitations cause human agents to use shortcut procedures such as the representativeness heuristic, and the representativeness heuristic gets the wrong answer. Hence, the representativeness heuristic is responsible for a cognitive bias.

The alleged cognitive bias in the Linda case provides just one part of Kahneman and Tversky’s overall program of heuristics and biases. They have argued that human subjects make errors with insensitivity to prior probabilities, insensitivity to sample size, misconceptions of chance, and misconceptions of regression. Importantly, these claims rely on the probability calculus as providing the correct normative standard. But should we think that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rationality?

One straightforward reason to think that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rational belief concerns logical consistency. Violation of the standard axioms of the probability calculus entails a set of inconsistent probabilistic statements. As such, degrees of belief that satisfy the probability calculus are often called “coherent” degrees of belief. For reasons similar to those given in the introduction to this article, it is often thought that it is not rational to believe a set of inconsistent propositions. Hence, it seems rational to obey the probability calculus.

However, there are significant worries with thinking that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rationality. First, following the rules of the probability calculus is computationally demanding. Independent of Kahneman and Tversky’s experimental results, we should anticipate that few humans would be able to maintain coherent degrees of probabilistic belief, for reasons of computational complexity alone. This observation would entail that humans are not rational, yet this goes against our commonsense view that humans are often quite rational. Indeed, it might be difficult to explain how we’re able to predict human behavior without the corresponding view that humans are usually rational. Insofar as our commonsense view of human rationality is worth preserving, we have reason to think that the probability calculus does not provide a correct normative standard.

A second worry concerns tautologies. According to standard interpretations of probability, every tautology gets assigned probability 1. But if the probability calculus provides a normative standard for belief, then it is rational for us to believe every tautology (for any set of evidence e). But this seems wrong. There are many complex propositions that are difficult to parse or interpret or even understand, but are nonetheless tautologies. Until one recognizes these propositions as instances of a tautology, it does not seem rational to believe just any tautology.

A third and final worry concerns the psychological nature and phenomenology of belief. If the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for belief then most of our contingent beliefs (for example, “the coffee cup is on the desk”) will have a precise numerical probability assignment, and this number will be less than 1. Call beliefs that are less than 1 but greater than 0.5 “likely beliefs”. Many of our familiar contingent beliefs will be likely beliefs (hence, getting some number assignment such as 0.99785), but it is unclear that our cognitive systems would be able to store or even compute vast amounts of probabilistic information. Belief seems to not work this way. There are, of course, projects in artificial intelligence that attempt to model similar probabilistic systems, but their results have not been universally convincing. Secondly, the phenomenology of belief suggests that many of our contingent beliefs are not “graded” entities that admit of some number, but are binary or “full” beliefs. When one believes that “the coffee cup is on the desk” it often feels like one “fully” believes it, rather than merely “partially” believing it (as would be required if the belief were assigned probability 0.99785). As an example, when reasoning about contingent matters of fact, we often treat our beliefs as full beliefs. Hence, the following reasoning seems both commonplace and acceptable, and does not require probabilities: “I think the coffee cup is in the office, so I should walk there to get the cup”. Hence, the phenomenology of belief gives a possible reason to doubt that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for belief.

4. References and Further Reading

a. References

Appiah, Anthony. (1990). “Minimal Rationality by Christopher Cherniak.” The Philosophical Review, 99 (1): 121–123.
Bartlett, Fredrick C. (1932). Remembering: A Study in Experimental and Social Psychology, Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Cherniak, Christopher. (1986). Minimal Rationality, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- An important work in the study of resource bounded agents. Discusses idealization in theories of rationality and conditions for agenthood.
Cowan, N. (2001). “The Magical Number 4 in Short-Term Memory: A Reconsideration of Mental Storage Capacity.” Behavioral Brain Science, 24: 87–185.
Feldman, Richard and Conee, Earl. (1985). “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies, 48: 15–34.
- Contains a discussion of “ought implies can” principles in epistemology.
Gigerenzer, Gerd. (2006). “Bounded and Rational.” In Stanton, Robert J. (ed.) Contemporary Debates in Cognitive Science, Oxford, Blackwell.
Gigerenzer, Gerd. (2007). Gut Feelings: The Intelligence of the Unconscious, New York, Viking.
- Summarizes and illustrates Gigerenzer’s program of “fast and frugal” heuristics, and is intended for a wide audience.
Lavie, N. (1995). “Perceptual Load as a Necessary Condition for Selective Attention.” Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance, 21: 451–468.
Lavie, N. (2005). “Distracted and Confused? Selective Attention Under Load.” Trends in Cognitive Science, 5: 75–82.
Macrae, C.N. and MacLeod, M.D. (1999). “On Recollections Lost: When Practice Makes Imperfect.” Journal of Personality and Social Psychology, 77: 463–473.
Miller, George A. (1956). “The Magical Number Seven, Plus or Minus Two: Some Limits On Our Capacity For Processing Information.” The Psychological Review, 63 (2): 81–97.
- Classic paper on memory limitations and an early example of the fields of cognitive science and cognitive psychology.
Piattelli-Palmarini, Massimo. (1994). Inevitable Illusions: How Mistakes of Reason Rule Our Minds, New York, John Wiley and Sons.
- Applies elements of the “heurisitics and biases” program and argues that these results help reveal common errors in judgment.
Pollock, John. (2006). Thinking About Acting: Logical Foundations for Rational Decision Making, Cambridge, Oxford University Press.
- Applying work from epistemology and cognitive science, Pollock proposes a theory of rational decision making for resource bounded agents.
Sears, Christopher R. and Pylyshyn, Zenon. (2000). “Multiple Object Tracking and Attentional Processing.” Canadian Journal of Experimental Psychology, 54 (1): 1–14.
Shaffer, Dennis M., Krauchunas, Scott M., Eddy, Marianna, and McBeath, Michael K. (2004). “How Dogs Navigate to Catch Frisbees.” Psychological Science, 15 (7): 437–441.
Simon, Herbert A. (1955). “A Behavioral Model of Rational Choice.” The Quarterly Journal of Economics, 69 (1): 99–118.
Simon, Herbert A. (1956). “Rational Choice and the Structure of the Environment.” Psychological Review, 63 (2): 129–138.
- An early description of the satisficing procedure.
Stroop, J.R. (1935). “Studies of Interference In Serial Verbal Reactions.” Journal of Experimental Psychology, 18: 643–662.
Thagard, Paul. (1982). “From the Descriptive to the Normative in Psychology and Logic.” Philosophy of Science, 49 (1): 24–42.
Tversky, Amos and Kahneman, Daniel. (1983). “Extensional Versus Intuitive Reasoning: The Conjunction Fallacy in Probability Judgment.” Psychological Review, 90 (4): 293–315.
- Contains the well-known “Linda” example of the conjunction fallacy in probabilistic judgment.
Xu, Yaoda and Chun, Marvin. (2009). “Selecting and Perceiving Multiple Visual Objects.” Trends in Cognitive Science, 13 (4): 167–174.

b. Further Reading

Bishop, Michael A. and Trout, J.D. (2005). Epistemology and the Psychology of Human Judgment, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- Discusses and offers critiques of various epistemic norms, often citing important work in cognitive science and cognitive psychology.
Christensen, David. (2005). Putting Logic in its Place, Cambridge, Oxford University Press.
- Provides discussion about the use of idealized models. Argues that the unattainability of idealized normative standards in epistemology does not undermine their normative force.
Gigerenzer, Gerd and Selten, Reinhard (eds.). (2001). Bounded Rationality: The Adaptive Toolbox, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- An influential collection of papers on bounded rationality.
Goldstein, E. Bruce. (2011). Cognitive Psychology: Connecting Mind, Research, and Everyday Experience. Belmont, Wadsworth.
- Introductory text in cognitive psychology. Some of the examples of cognitive limitations from section 1 were drawn from this text.
Kahneman, Daniel. (2011). Thinking Fast and Slow. New York, Farrar, Straus, and Giroux.
- Provides an overview of the “heuristics and biases” program and the two-system model of judgment.
Morton, Adam. (2012). Bounded Thinking: Intellectual Virtues for Limited Agents, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- A virtue-theoretic account of bounded rationality and bounded thinking. Addresses how agents should manage limitations.
Rubinstein, Ariel. (1998). Modeling Bounded Rationality, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- Provides examples of formal models for resource bounded agents.
Rysiew, Patrick. (2008). “Rationality Disputes — Psychology and Epistemology.” Philosophy Compass, 3 (6): 1153–1176.
- Good discussion and overview of the “rationality wars” debate in cognitive science and epistemology.
Simon, Herbert A. (1982). Models of Bounded Rationality, Vol. 2, Behavioral Economics and Business Organization. Cambridge, MIT Press.
- Collection of some of Simon’s influential papers on bounded rationality and procedural rationality.
Weirich, Paul. (2004). Realistic Decision Theory: Rules for Nonideal Agents in Nonideal Circumstances, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- Argues for principles of decision making that apply to realistic, non-ideal agents.

Author Information

Jacob Caton
Email: jcaton@astate.edu
Arkansas State University
U. S. A.

Gender in Chinese Philosophy

The concept of gender is foundational to the general approach of Chinese thinkers. Yin and yang, core elements of Chinese cosmogony, involve correlative aspects of “dark and light,” “female and male,” and “soft and hard.” These notions, with their deeply-rooted gender connotations, recognize the necessity of interplay between these different forces in generating and carrying forward the world. The major thinkers of China’s first philosophic flourishing—traditionally referred to as the Hundred Schools, c. 500s-200s B.C.E.—inherited and further developed this comprehensively gendered view of the world. These concepts continue to shape contemporary Chinese thought, as well. Historically, the most influential Chinese perspectives on the issue of gender come from what are commonly referred to as Confucian and Daoist traditions of thought, which take somewhat opposing positions. Many texts associated with Confucianism emphasize yang’s dominant, male-related characteristics, whereas those linked to Daoism, especially the Laozi, reverse this view, finding value in yin’s subordinate, female characteristics. However, it should be noted that Chinese thinkers, regardless of their classification as Confucian or Daoist, generally see the opposing qualities of yin and yang as integral parts of a whole that complement one another. Accordingly, the closest word to “gender” in modern Chinese is xingbie, which can be quite literally understood as a difference (bie) of individual nature or tendencies (xing). The word generally, however, refers to the physiological characteristics that then provide the basis for corresponding social identities. The genders, in terms of social roles, are not defined absolutely or theoretically, but rather through the mutually reciprocal, physical, generative relationship between male and female. They are understood correlatively, and determined by their context and dynamic tendencies as they interact with one another. Such traditions within Chinese thought may be applied as resources for contemporary feminist philosophy, albeit not without considerable caution.

Introduction
Human Tendencies (Nature) and Gender
Gender Cosmology
Gender and Social Order
Family Patterns
Chinese Cultural Resources for Feminism
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

There is a debate in contemporary Chinese academic circles about whether or not the idea of “gender” or “gender concepts” actually applies to traditional Chinese thought. Chinese scholars argue about the presence of “male” (xiong) and “female” (ci) characteristics, differences, and relations in the context of ancient Chinese philosophy. Although affirming this interpretation would provide a space for comparative studies with Western traditions, some thinkers believe that doing so distorts traditional Chinese thought.

Zhang Xianglong is a prominent representative of those who think that Chinese philosophy and culture have long been influenced by concepts of gender. For him, Chinese thinking is fundamentally gendered as it takes the interaction between male and female as the basic model for philosophical investigations. He further argues that it is one of the core aspects of mainstream thought in China. Zhang demonstrates that yin and yang strongly connote ideas of female and male, and identifies such gendered thought in works as early as the Zhouyi, or Yijing (Book of Changes), a traditional Chinese divinatory text of uncertain antiquity consisting of hexagrams and their interpretations, as well as throughout the later traditions of Confucianism, Daoism, and Chinese Buddhism. Accordingly, he argues that yin and women have “in principle never been doomed to be inferior” and “discrimination against women in ancient Chinese culture is neither deterministic nor universal” (Zhang 2002:5). Such a claim is dubious, as the dualistic dynamic of yin and yang, while positing both aspects as essential to existence and in this way ontologically equal, has been generally presented as inherently hierarchical. Chen Jiaqi opposes Zhang’s broader position, arguing that yin and yang are not necessarily related to gender. For Chen, yin and yang primarily involve social relationships, political forms, and weighing advantages and disadvantages. He holds that gender characteristics are too abstract to be practically relevant in this context, and do not apply directly to social forms (Chen 2003).

From a historical perspective, Chen’s interpretation is less convincing than Zhang’s. There are numerous Chinese texts where yin and yang are broadly associated with gender. While yang and yin are not exclusively defined as “male” and “female,” and either sex can be considered yin or yang within a given context, in terms of their most general relation to one another, yin references the female and yang the male. For example, the Daoist text known as the Taipingjing (Scripture of Great Peace) records that “the male and female are the root of yin and yang.” The Han dynasty Confucian thinker Dong Zhongshu (195-115 B.C.E.) also writes, “Yin and yang of the heavens and the earth [which together refer to the cosmos] should be male and female, and the male and female should be yin and yang. Thereby, yin and yang can be called male and female, and male and female can be called yin and yang.” These and other texts draw a strong link between yin as female and yang as male. However, it is important to also recognize that gender itself is not as malleable as yin and yang, despite this connection. While gender remains fixed, their coupling with yin and yang is not. This close and complex relationship means yin and yang themselves require examination if their role in Chinese gender theory is to be properly understood.

The original meaning of yin and yang had little to do with gender differences. Some of the earliest uses of yin and yang are found in the Shangshu (Book of Documents). Here, the word yang is employed six times, and five times it denotes the southern side of mountains, which receives the most sunlight. The term yin appears three times in the text, and refers to the shadier northern side of mountains. These examples are characteristic of how yin and yang function throughout Chinese intellectual history; they do not refer to particular objects, but act as correlative categorizations. In most instances yin and yang are used to indicate a specific relationship within a determined context. The way sunshine falls on a mountain is the context, and the difference between the northern and southern sides, where the latter receives more light and warmth, determines their association, which is understood as yin and yang. The terms are thereby an expression of the function of the sun on a particular place, but they do not speak to the actual substance of the objects (the sun or mountain) themselves. The specific traits of the objects can only be designated yin and yang in their functional correlation to one another. Within this matrix, yin things share commonalities when viewed in relation to yang things.

In this way, the early association of yin and yang with gender can be seen as speaking to the relationship between genders, and not to their essential or substantial natures. Yin and yang traits were thus seen as able to accurately describe broad differences between males and females as they interact with one another. Fixing the link between these categorizations, having men be yang in relation to women, who are yin, only works in a highly abstract or broad sense. For example, the Book of Changes states that the emperor is supposed to have six male ministers at the south palace (a yang position) and six wives or concubines at the north palace (a yin position). Like the southern and northern sides of a mountain, men and women are yang and yin in the way they serve the emperor. Social positions are linked to gender and understood through yin and yang. The Liji (Record of Rituals) states that “the male is outside, and the wife inside the home. The sun starts in the east and the moon starts in the west. This is the distinction of yin and yang, the positions of husband and wife.” However, in specific contexts, it is possible for the association to be reversed. For instance, in Dong Zhongshu’s Chunqiu Fanlu (Spring and Autumn Annals), we also find that “the sovereign is yang, the minister is yin; the father is yang, the son is yin.” Here males, such as ministers or sons, can also be considered yin. The entire pattern can be overturned, as well, such as in the relationship between an empress and her male ministers, where the woman is yang and the men are considered yin. However, such a situation was often considered something that should be approached with caution, as it violated natural patterns. For example, Wang Bi (226-249 C.E.), who did not care much for Dong Zhongshu’s cosmological interpretation, still argued that a woman who was too strong was not to be married.

In terms of actual practice, the more generalized and stable affiliation between yin as female and yang as male often won out, as exemplified by Wang’s idea. It was commonly appropriated as an ideological tool for backing the oppression of women, especially after Dong Zhongshu’s theories took hold. Dong, whose version of Confucianism won imperial backing during the Han dynasty, was also responsible for promoting the official establishment of a formal cosmology based on yin and yang, which became quite influential in the Chinese tradition. While he allows for men to be understood as yin and women as yang in certain contexts, overall he sought to limit the scope of such reversals. For Dong, males are dominant, powerful, and moral, and therefore yang. Women, on the other hand, are precisely the opposite—subservient, weak, selfish, and jealous—and best described as yin. As a result, female virtues became largely oriented toward social roles, especially women’s duties as wives (for example, the female virtues of chastity and compliancy). Against this biased intellectual background, oppressive practices were supported and initiated. For instance, the widespread acceptance of concubinage and female foot binding in Chinese social history expressed the inequality between genders.

However, this social inequality did not accurately reflect its culture’s philosophical thought. Most Chinese thinkers were very attentive to the advantageousness of the complementary nature of male and female characteristics. In fact, in many texts considered Confucian that are predominant for two millennia of Chinese thought, the political system and gender roles are integrated (Yang 2013). This integration is based on understanding yin and yang as fundamentally affixed to gender and thereby permeating all aspects of social life. Sinologists such as Joseph Needham have identified a “feminine symbol” in Chinese culture, rooted in the Daoist concentration on yin. Roger Ames and David Hall similarly argue that yin and yang indicate a “difference in emphasis rather than difference in kind” and should be viewed as a whole, and that therefore their relationship can be likened to that of male and female traits (Ames and Hall 1998: 90-96). Overall, while the complementary understanding of yin and yang did not bring about gender equality in traditional Chinese society, it remains a key factor for comprehending Chinese conceptions of gender. As Robin Wang has noted, “on the one hand, yinyang seems to be an intriguing and valuable conceptual resource in ancient Chinese thought for a balanced account of gender equality; on the other hand, no one can deny the fact that the inhumane treatment of women throughout Chinese history has often been rationalized in the name of yinyang” (Wang 2012: xi).

2. Human Tendencies (Nature) and Gender

Gender issues play an important role in the history of Chinese thought. Many thinkers theorized about the significance of gender in a variety of areas. The precondition for this discussion is an interpretation of xing, “nature” or “tendencies.” The idea of “differences of xing” constitutes the modern term for “gender,” xingbie (literally “tendency differences”) making xing central to this discussion. It should be noted that the Chinese understanding of xing, including “human xing,” is closer to “tendency” or “propensity” than traditional Western conceptions of human “nature.” This is mainly because xing is not seen as something static or unchangeable. (It is for this reason that Ames and Hall, in the quote above, highlight the difference between “emphasis” and “kind.”) The way xing is understood greatly contributes to the way arguments about gender unfold.

The term xing first became an important philosophical concept in discussions about humanity and eventually human tendency, or renxing. In terms of its composition, the character xing is made up of a vertical representation of xin, “heart-mind” (the heart was thought to be the organ responsible for both thoughts and feelings/emotions) on the left side. This complements the character sheng, to the right, which can mean “generation,” “grow,” or “give birth to.” In many cases, the way sheng is understood has a significant impact on interpreting xing and gender. As a noun, sheng can mean “natural life,” which gives rise to theories about “original nature” or “foundational tendencies” (benxing). It thereby connotes vital activities and physiological desires or needs. It is in this sense that Mengzi (372-289 B.C.E.) describes human tendencies (renxing) as desiring to eat and have sex. He also says that form and color are natural characteristics, or natural xing. The Record of Rituals similarly comments that food, drink, and relations between men and women are defining human interests. Xunzi (312-238 B.C.E.), generally regarded as the last great classical Confucian thinker, fundamentally disagreed with Mengzi’s claim that humans naturally tend toward what is good or moral. He did, however, similarly classify xing as the desire for food, warmth, and rest.

Sheng can also be a verb, which gives xing a slightly different connotation. As a verb, sheng indicates creation and growth, and thus supports the suggestion that xing should be understood as human growth through the development of one’s heart-mind, the root, or seat, of human nature or tendencies. The Mengzi expressly refers to this, stating that xing is understood through the heart-mind. This also marks the distinction between humans and animals. A human xing provides specific characteristics and enables a certain orientation for growth that is unique in that it includes a moral dimension. It is in this sense that Mengzi proposes his theory for natural human goodness, a suggestion that Xunzi later rebuts, albeit upon a similar understanding of xing. Texts classified as Daoist, such as the Laozi and Zhuangzi, similarly affirm that xing is what endows beings with their particular virtuousness (though it is not necessarily moral).

It is on the basis of human nature/tendencies that their unique capacity for moral cultivation is given. The Xing Zi Ming Chu (Recipes for Nourishing Life), a 4^th century B.C.E. text recovered from the Guodian archaeological site, comments that human beings are defined by the capacity and desire to learn. Natural human tendencies are thereby not simply inherent, they also need to be grown and refined. The Mengzi argues that learning is nothing more than developing and cultivating aspects of one’s own heart-mind. The Xunzi agrees, adding that too much change or purposeful change can bring about falsity—which often results in immoral thoughts, feelings, or actions. These texts agree in their argument that there are certain natural patterns or processes for each thing, and deviating from these is potentially dangerous. Anything “false” or out of accordance with these patterns is likely to be immoral and harmful to oneself and society, so certain restrictions are placed on human practice to promote moral growth. These discussions look at human tendencies as largely shaped in the context of society, and can be taken as a conceptual basis for understanding gender as a natural tendency that is steered through social institutions. For example, when Mengzi is asked why the ancient sage-ruler Shun lied to his parents in order to marry, Mengzi defends Shun as doing the right thing. Explaining that otherwise Shun would have remained a bachelor, Mengzi writes, “The greatest of human relations is that a man and a woman live together.” Thus Mengzi argues that Shun’s moral character was based on proper cultivation of his natural tendencies according to social mores.

One’s individual nature is largely influenced, and to some extent even generated, by one’s cultural surroundings. This also produces physiological properties that account for a wide variety of characteristics that are then reflected in aspects of gender, culture, and social status. Linked to the understanding of yin and yang as functionally codependent categorizations, differences between genders are characterized on the basis of their distinguishing features, and defined correlatively. This means that behavior and identity largely arise within the context of male-female relations. One’s natural tendencies include gender identity as either xiong xing (male tendencies) or ci xing (female tendencies), which one is supposed to cultivate accordingly. Thus there are more physiological and cultural aspects to human tendencies, as well. In these diverse ways, Chinese philosophy emphasizes the difference between males and females, believing that each has their own particular aspects to offer, which are complementary and can be unified to form a harmonious whole (though this does not necessarily imply their equality).

3. Gender Cosmology

The idea of gender as being fundamentally understood through respective dissimilarities (nan nü you bie) is based in the physiological differences between men and women, but also manifests in philosophic thought. In fact, in one of the earliest references to the distinction between men and women, the Record of Rituals asserts:

Once there is a difference between males and females, then there can be love between fathers and sons. Once there is love between fathers and sons, obligations are generated. Once obligations are generated, rituals are made. Once rituals are made, all things can be at ease.

The original difference between genders is—presumably through the generative power of their combination—the foundation for obligations (or morality) and thus ritual (or social moral patterns), which allows finally for harmony in the cosmos as a whole. Through the establishment of the concept that human tendencies are formed and act in line with nature, Chinese gender cosmology applies an analogous generative model of yin and yang to a general understanding of the world.

Another early text, the 3^rd century B.C.E. medical compendium Huangdi Neijing (Inner Scripture of the Yellow Emperor), offers one of the most comprehensive definitions of yin and yang:

Yin and yang are the dao (“way”) of the heavens and earth, they provide the model for the net (gangji) of all beings, they are the parents of all change and transformation, and the origin of life and death, and the residence for spirit and insight. To heal illness [one] must seek its root. (Zhang 2002: 41)

Here, yin and yang are taken as a pattern embedded in the existence of all beings, thus providing the foundation for a coherent worldview. This weaves together human beings, nature, and dao (way) in a manner that creates a dynamic wholeness pervaded by and mediated through the interaction of yin and yang. This Chinese cosmological view sees all things, including humans, as borne of both yin and yang and thus naturally integrated with one another. In essence, dao represents the interaction between yin and yang, and it is in this respect that the Laozi tells us that dao is both the source and the model, or pattern, for all things (Laozi 25). More directly, the Laozi comments that all things in turn carry yin and embrace yang (Laozi 42). This shows that through yin and yang and their patterns of interaction dao provides the rhythm of the cosmos. From this perspective the genders also complement and nourish one another, and are even vital to one another.

The idea that the interaction of yin and yang generates the myriad things in existence corresponds to intercourse between male and female as the only means for reproducing life. Therefore, the nature of men and women in Chinese philosophy is not only based on purely physiological characteristics and differences, but is also the embodiment of yin and yang forces in gender. The dao of men and women are linked to the dao of the universe in terms of reproducing life. This is systematically discussed in the Book of Changes, one of China’s most ancient and influential texts. There, eight trigrams are given, which represent eight natural phenomena and can further be combined to form sixty-four hexagrams. These are expressions of the function and movement of yin and yang. They are composed of two contrasting symbols: the yang-yao unbroken horizontal line, and the yin-yao broken horizontal line. Some scholars see these as referring to the male and female genitals respectively. In this sense, the first two hexagrams qian or “heaven” (which is six yang-yaos) and kun or “earth” (six yin-yaos) can be interpreted as representing pure yin and yang. They are also responsible for the formation of general gender stereotypes in Chinese thought. They provide the gateways for change, and are considered, quite literally, the father and mother of all other hexagrams (which equates to all things in the world). The broad system of the Book of Changes attempts to explain every type of change and existence, and is built upon an identification of yin and yang with the sexes as well as their interaction with one another.

According to the “Xici Zhuan” (Commentary on the Appended Phrases) section of the Book of Changes, qian is equated with the heavens, yang, power, and creativity, while kun is identified with the earth, yin, receptivity, and preservation. Their interaction generates all things and events in a way that is similar to the intercourse between males and females, bringing about new life. The Commentary on the Appended Phrases makes the link to gender issues clear by stating that both qian and kun have their own daos (ways) that are responsible for the male and female respectively. The text goes on to discuss the interaction between the two, both cosmologically in terms of the heavens and earth and biologically in terms of the sexes. The conclusion is that their combination and interrelation is responsible for all living things and their changes. The intercourse between genders is a harmonization of yin and yang that is necessary not only for an individual’s well-being, but also for the proper functioning of the cosmos. Interaction between genders is thus the primary mechanism of life, which explains all forms of generation, transformation, and existence.

4. Gender and Social Order

Theoretically, the social order of gender in Chinese thought is broadly formed on the concepts of the heavens and earth and yin and yang. When these notions are applied to the social field, they are likened to the male and female genders. In the aforementioned Commentary on the Appended Phrases, heaven and yang are considered honorable, while the earth and yin are seen as lowly in comparison. Since the former are coupled with qian, which comprises maleness, and the latter with kun, which marks femaleness, these gender roles are valued similarly. The Inner Scripture of the Yellow Emperor says that yang’s maleness is meant for the outside, and yin’s femaleness for the inside. Men, being equated here with yang, are also associated with superiority, motion, and firmness, while women are coupled with yin and so seen as inferior, still, and gentle. Gender cosmology then largely replaced more dynamic views of gender roles with sharply defined unequal relationships, and these were generally echoed throughout the culture. The social order that emerged from this thought saw men as largely in charge of external affairs and superior to women.

The specific operational mode for maintaining this social order and its gender distinctions is li, propriety or ritual. The Record of Rituals focuses much of its discourse on specific rules regarding distinct practices reserved for certain individuals through gender categorization. In this way, wedding ceremonies are the root of propriety. Marriage is especially important because it is politically valuable for establishing and sustaining social order through designated male-female relations. In the Record of Rituals, men and women are asked to observe strict separation in society and uphold the distinction between the outer and inner. (Men being responsible for the family’s “outer” dealings, including legal, economic, and political affairs, and women the “inner” ones, such as familial relations and housework.) Social roles were thereby moralized according to gender. The Record of Rituals also tells us that the rites as a couple begin with gender responsibilities. It states, for example, that when outside the home the husband is supposed to lead the way and that the wife should follow. However, within the home women were supposed to obey men as well, even boys. Before marriage, a girl was expected to listen to her father, and then after marriage to be obedient to her husband, or to their sons if he died. These general guidelines are commonly referred to in other texts as the sancong side or “three obediences and four virtues,” which dominated theories of proper social ordering for most of China’s history.

The four virtues—women’s virtue (fude), women’s speech (fuyan), women’s appearance (furong), and women’s work (fugong)—were expounded on by Ban Zhao (45-120 C.E.) in her book Nüjie (Admonitions for Women). She believed that women should be conservative, humble, and quiet in expressing ritual or filial propriety as their virtue. In the same way, a women’s speech should not be “flowery” or persuasive, but yielding and circumspect. She should also pay close attention to her appearance, be clean and proper, and act especially carefully around guests and in public. Her work consists mainly in household practicalities, such as weaving and food preparation.

The sancong (three obediences) can also be regarded as a forerunner to the san gang, or “three cardinal guides,” of the later Han dynasty (25-220 C.E.). The three cardinal guides were put forward by the aforementioned Dong Zhongshu and contributed greatly to integrating yin and yang gender cosmology into the framework of Confucian ethics. These guides are regulations about relationships—they are defined as the ruler guiding ministers, fathers guiding sons, and husbands guiding wives. Although these rules lack specific content, they do provide a general understanding for ordering society that is concentrated on proper relationships, which is the basic element for morality in many Confucian texts. Here a strong gender bias emerges. The partiality shown toward the elevated position of husbands is only further bolstered by the other two relationships being completely male-based. The only time females are mentioned they are last. Moreover, the ranking of the relationships themselves are hierarchical, relegating women to the lowest level of this order.

Dong also elaborated on distinguishing goodness from evil based on elevating things associated with yang and its general characteristics as ultimately superior to yin, and at the same time emphasized their connections to gender characteristics. This further reinforces deep gender bias. The language of Dong’s Spring and Autumn Annals praises males and presents a negative view of females and all things feminine. The text explicitly argues that even if there are ways in which the husband is inferior to the wife, the former is still yang and therefore better overall. Even more drastically, it states that evilness and all things bad belong to yin, while goodness and all things good are associated with yang, which clearly implicitly links good and evil to male and female, respectively. There are places where, due to the interrelated correlative relationship between yin and yang, the female might be yang and therefore superior in certain aspects, but since she is mostly yin, she is always worse overall. The text even goes so far as to require that relationships between men and women be adjusted to strictly conform to the three cardinal guides. Rules require that subjects obey their rulers, children their fathers, and wives their husbands. In Dong’s other writings, he goes a step further, declaring that the three cardinal guides are a mandate of the heavens. This gives cosmological support to his social arrangement, equating male superiority with the natural ordering of all things.

In the Baihutong (Philosophical Discussions in the White Tiger Hall), which is a collection of court debates from the later Han dynasty, discourse on Dong’s guidelines is taken further. During this time, Confucianism was established as the official state ideology and heavily influenced many areas of politics, including court functioning, policies, and education. This, in turn, provided the foundation for a Confucian society in which this ideology successfully penetrated the daily lives of the state’s entire populace. Dong’s interpretation of ancient texts, including his reading of gender cosmology, became especially powerful as Confucianism believes that the basis for social order and morality begins in human interaction, not individuals. In this context, people are mainly understood according to their roles in society or relationships with others, which were already established as naturally hierarchical in the Analects (the record of Confucius’s actions and words). Dong’s work added a distinct favoring of male over female that became increasingly established and widespread as Confucianism became increasingly influential. Conceived of as analogous to the relationship between rulers and ministers, teachers and students, or parents and children, the two sexes were generally assumed to be a natural ordering of the superior and inferior.

Although these sexist trends are not found in earlier texts—at least not explicitly—they became quite common after the Han dynasty. (The most controversial exception to this is in Analects 17:25, where Confucius is recorded to have equated petty people and women; however, it is unclear exactly what he meant, and whether or not he was referring to women in general or just “petty” ones.) By the Song dynasty (960-1279 C.E.), mainstream political and intellectual discourse viewed both the ability and moral character of women as significantly inferior to males. The Confucian classic known as the Shijing (Book of Poetry) includes the controversial line “Male intellect builds states, female intellect topples states” (Zhou 2002: 489), which in the Song dynasty became understood as an argument for keeping women out of politics and state affairs. On this basis, the Neo-Confucian thinker Zhu Xi (1130-1200) criticized Wu Zetian, China’s only female emperor, arguing that failure to observe Dong’s three cardinal guides was ultimately responsible for the chaos, violence, and civil wars that had followed the Tang dynasty (618-907 C.E.). Later, during the Ming dynasty (1368-1644 C.E.), the Confucian thinker Zhang Dai (1597-1679 C.E.) developed the idea that males express virtuousness through their ability to debate and contend with one another, while women find virtuousness in lacking this skill. Although he did not expound much on this idea, it was taken to mean that women were both unable and ought not contend with others, including their husband. Their obedience was a display of morality. Similarly, men were expected to dominate their wives in a somewhat disrespectful manner in order to display their own ethical cultivation. In more extreme interpretations, Zhang’s notion was read as “a woman without talent is virtuous.” This was linked to the cosmological understanding of gender roles so that failure to follow these guides meant the betrayal of natural patterns—the traditional foundation for ethical norms. During this time, imperial law stated that any man over forty without a male heir must take on a concubine to aid him in producing one.

The domination of these views in both culture and philosophy caused the Chinese tradition to attach great importance to hierarchical gender roles. Social order based itself on cosmological theories that were automatically normative and constituted guidelines for moral cultivation. Despite the Book of Changes and Laozi’s emphasis on the importance of the interaction between yin and yang as complementary and mutually constitutive, women were generally regarded as inferior.

5. Family Patterns

Ideal political and social order in the state was regarded as a replication of the family model on a larger scale. The way neighbors interacted, friends treated one another, and ministers served rulers were all based on models of familial relationships. Early Confucian texts provided the ideological foundation for this pattern by arguing that morality must be cultivated at home first before it could be adequately practiced in society. In terms of gender, the hierarchical relationships in socio-political spheres were simply extensions of the superiority of husbands in spousal relations. The Record of Rituals explains, “Just as two rulers cannot coexist in one country, a household cannot have two masters; only one can govern” (Zheng 2008: 2353). Dong Zhongshu’s three cardinal guides promoted this attitude by requiring that wives listen to their husbands in the same way that children should listen to fathers and then further placing the spousal relationship below that of father and son. Zhu Xi bolstered this order by arguing that children should respect both parents, but that the father should be absolutely superior to the mother. Zhu recognized that there were aspects of life, mostly household affairs (nei), that women were well suited for, but saw men’s duties as superior, and therefore advocated that males always dominate females.

In line with the mutual relationship of yin and yang emphasized by the Book of Changes and Daoism, marriages were largely understood as being a deferential equivalence. The wedding rites in the Record of Rituals say that marriages are important for maintaining ancestral sacrifice and family lineages. The text describes that when a groom gives a salute, the bride can sit, and that during the ceremony they should eat at the same table and drink from the same bottle to display their mutual affection, trust, and support. This also aligns the woman, who had no official rank of her own, with her husband’s rank. The Record of Rituals further records that during China’s first dynasties, enlightened monarchs respected their wives and children, and that this is in line with natural order or dao. The Xiaojing (Classic of Filial Piety) also says that rulers should never insult even their concubines, let alone their wives. Although only leaders are mentioned, according to Chinese ethical systems people are supposed to emanate their superiors, so this deference would ideally be practiced in every household. However, such roles were largely based on function. For men this meant learning, working, and carrying on the ancestral line. Women were in charge of household affairs and principally responsible for producing a male heir. If they failed in the latter, their martial function was largely unfulfilled, which reflected poorly on the husband, as well. Since the women’s function was largely mechanistic, her status was much lower and she was essentially anonymous, without independent social standing. Men could take on concubines to produce heirs or simply for pleasure, and while wives were “in charge” of concubines, they could also be (albeit rarely) replaced by them, and would have to serve the sons of concubines if they produced none of their own. Legally, men owned their wives, and there was often little practical recourse for a woman against her husband, even though the laws of certain periods allowed for it.

The Book of Poetry contains a large number of poems and songs describing marriage and love between men and women, some of which express the joys and sorrows of women. The collection includes lamentations of men going off on business or to war, and women’s complaints of being abandoned by their husbands after concubines are purchased. They are meant to remind husbands of social expectations and moral responsibilities. The Lienüzhuan (Biographies of Virtuous Women) and Xunzi both argue that the husband-wife relation is foundational for the family, and therefore for a stable society, as well. (The Zhongyong, or Doctrine of the Mean, adds that the sage’s virtue is found most simply in husband-wife relations.) Liu Xiang (77 B.C.E.-6 C.E.), the complier of the Lienüzhuan, firmly believed that morality starts in the family and reverberates out into society. He grouped virtuous women into six categories, or virtues: maternal rectitude (muyi), sage-like intelligence (xianming), humane wisdom (renzhi), purity and deference (zhenshun), chastity and dutifulness (jieyi), and skill in arguments and communication (biantong). Later editions of this text became less gender specific, but Liu emphasized women who were able to carry out certain female-related duties in role-specific conditions (including those of daughter, wife, daughter-in-law, and mother). Although Liu did not mention it, later texts argued that widows should not remarry or take on lovers. The Neo-Confucian thinker Cheng Yi (1033-1107) was one of the harshest interpreters of widow fidelity, claiming that they should rather starve to death than take on a second husband. Zhu Xi, who disagreed with Cheng on many issues, argued that this was not practical; yet it was generally regarded as virtuous, even if not widely practiced. Cheng’s proposal was also important because he did not restrict such devotion to women, which created a rare sense of equality (of which Zhu also disapproved).

Analogous to yin and yang, the relationship of the wife and “inner” with the husband and “outer” is conceived of as complementary, not dualistic. According to the functional distinction of “inner” and “outer,” women were responsible for everything in the house, while men dominated external affairs. The most basic form of this division was given as “Men plow and women weave” (nan geng nü zhi). However, this distinction is not equivalent to the Western concepts of private and public. In fact, during the Wei-Jin period of national disunity (265-420 C.E.), it was common for women in northern Chinese states to handle family legal matters at court, go out to present gifts, and handle certain business matters. The woman’s role was not always marginalized, but it was focused on specific tasks. Chinese families often believed that educating their daughters well (though not necessarily in literary learning) was the precondition for improving the family and encouraging orderliness. Women were also often the primary caretakers and to some extent educators of all children, male or female—an invaluable role for the entire household. A couple’s shared goals, like obtaining wealth or educating children, were designated into separate spheres that either the wife or husband would control. The third-century B.C.E. philosophical miscellany known as Lüshi Chunqiu (Mr. Lü’s Spring and Autumn Annals) declares that husbands should have clothes to wear without weaving and wives have food to eat without farming because of their division of labor, which allows for a more efficacious family and society. Individual differences should be acknowledged so that the couple can support and assist one another.

6. Chinese Cultural Resources for Feminism

Taking yin and yang as an analogy for female and male, classical Chinese thought presents a complex picture of their interaction. Firstly, with thinkers such as Dong Zhongshu, the split between the two genders can be seen as relatively fixed. On this basis regulations on gender roles are equally stabilized, so that they are considered complementary, but not equal. The second major trend, seen most explicitly in the Laozi, values the inseparability of yin and yang, which is equated with the female and male. This interpretation explores the productive and efficacious nature of yin, or feminine powers. While not necessarily feminist, this latter view provides a robust resource for exploring feminism in Chinese thought. These two orientations were developed along the lines of their respective representatives in Chinese traditions.

Like the relationship between yin and yang, a complementary relationship can be seen between these two views on gender. Thinkers such as Confucius, Mengzi, Xunzi, Dong Zhongshu, and Zhu Xi are often taken to represent Confucianism, which belongs to the first viewpoint. The Laozi and Zhuangzi have then been seen as opposed to these thinkers, and are representative of Daoism. However, the actual relationship between these two “schools” is much more integrated. For example, Wang Bi wrote what is generally regarded as the standard commentary on the Laozi, and yet he considered Confucius to be a higher sage than Laozi. Similarly, actual Chinese social practices cannot be traced back to either Daoism or Confucianism exclusively, though one or the other may be more emphasized in particular cases. Taken as separate, they each highlight different aspects that, when integrated with one another, represent a whole. Although they are sometimes read as opposing views, both are equally indispensable for comprehending Chinese culture and history.

Despite the possibility of reading feminism into many Chinese texts, there can be no doubt that the Chinese tradition, as practiced, was largely sexist. For the most part, the inferior position of women was based on readings (whether or not they were misinterpretations) of texts generally classified as Confucian, such as the Record of Rituals, Book of Poetry, or Analects. On the other hand, other texts regarded as Confucian—such as the Book of Changes or Classic of Filial Piety—harbor rich resources for feminism in China. So while sexist practices are and were frequently defended on the basis of Confucian texts, this is limited to particular passages, and does not speak to the complexity of either Confucianism or Chinese traditions in general.

As a response to dominant practices, the Laozi—regardless of whether it was formed earlier or later than other major texts, such as the Analects—favors notions that counter (but do not necessarily oppose) early social values. While the Record of Rituals and Book of Poetry contain or promote hierarchical interpretations of gender issues, the Laozi clearly promotes nominally feminine characteristics and values. (This puts the Laozi in conflict with some branches of feminism that seek to destroy notions of “female” or gender-oriented traits and tendencies.) While this does not necessarily equate the Laozi with what is now called “feminism,” it does provide Chinese culture with a potential resource for reviving or creating conceptions of femininity in a more positive light.

The major philosophical concept in the Laozi is dao (way). The first chapter of the text claims that the unchanging dao cannot be spoken of, but it does offer clues in the form of a variety of images that appear throughout its eighty-one chapters. Several of the descriptions associate dao with the feminine, maternal, or female “gate.” In this context, dao is given three important connotations. It is responsible for the origin of all things, it is all things, and it provides the patterns that they should follow. The comparison to a woman’s body and its function of generation (sheng) identify dao as feminine, and therefore speak to the power of the female. The Laozi can therefore be read as advocating that female powers and positions are superior to their male counterparts. In modern scholarship, this is frequently noted, and several scholars have attempted to use the Laozi to support Chinese and comparative feminist studies. Images in the text strongly support these investigations.

For example, the text speaks of the gushen, the “spirit of the valley,” which is said to “never die” and is called xuanpin, or “mysterious femininity” (ch. 6). The character for “spirit,” gu, originally meant “generation.” It is identified with sheng (part of the character for gender and tendencies), and its shape is sometimes taken to represent the female genitals. In other places, dao is referred to as the mother and said to have given birth to all things (ch. 52). Contemporary scholars also point out that there are no “male” images or traditionally male traits linked to dao in the Laozi. Dao’s characteristics, such as being “low,” “soft,” and “weak,” are all associated with yin and femininity, thereby forging a strong link between dao and the female.

Yin tendencies are not, however, exclusively valued. The Laozi offers a more balanced view, which is why it can be used as a resource of feminism, but is not necessarily feminist itself. For example, it says that all things come from dao and that they carry the yin and embrace the yang, and that their blending is what produces harmony in the world (ch. 42). Yin is arguably more basic, but is prized for its ability to overcome yang, just as the soft can overcome the hard and stillness can defeat movement. These notions are applied to many aspects of life, including sexual, political, and military examples. These examples revere female traits, arguing that yin should be acknowledged for its numerous strengths, but do not reject the importance of yang.

Taken as a political text, the Laozi argues that the ruler should take on more female than male traits in order to properly govern the world. This is supposed to allow him to remain “still” while others are in motion, ideally self-ordering. Although this confirms the usefulness of female virtue, it is not an argument for it being superior, or even equal to male counterparts. Rather, it demonstrates how female characteristics can be used to promote efficacy.

Given that sexist practices have largely be defended by reference to texts and scholars that self-identify with the Confucian tradition, it is easy to see why contemporary scholars have looked to the Laozi as one of the major sources for constructing Chinese feminism. It is certainly the first major Chinese philosophical text that explicitly promotes a variety of female traits and values, which allows room for feminist consciousness and discourse.

7. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger T., and David L. Hall. Thinking from the Han: Self, Truth, and Transcendence in Chinese and Western Culture. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 1998.
- (This book includes a chapter on gender roles that outlines how the Confucian tradition can be used to establish a foundation for Chinese gender equality.)
Ames, Roger T., and Henry Rosemont Jr., trans. The Analects of Confucius: A Philosophical Translation. New York, NY: Ballantine Books, 1998.
- (An excellent translation of the Confucian Analects.)
Bossler, Beverly. Courtesans, Concubines and the Cult of Female Fidelity: Gender and Social Change in China, 1000–1400. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2012.
- (A superb study of how female roles and virtues shaped Chinese family life, politics,and academics.)
Chen, Jiaqi. “Critique of Zhang Xianglong.” Zhejiang Academic Journal 4 (2003): 127–130.
- (This article points out inequalities of gender rules in Chinese philosophy and social systems.)
Moeller, Hans-Georg, trans. Daodejing: A Complete Translation and Commentary. Chicago, IL: Open Court, 2007.
- (Moeller’s commentary is sensitive to feminist interpretations of the Daodejing or Laozi.)
Rosenlee, Li-Hsiang. Confucianism and Women. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 2006.
- (A book-length study of gender roles in the Confucian tradition.)
Van Norden, Bryan, trans. Mengzi, with Selections from Traditional Commentaries. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing, 2008.
- (A masterful translation of the Mengzi with commentaries from traditional Chinese scholars.)
Wang, Robin R. Yinyang: The Way of Heaven and Earth in Chinese Thought and Culture. NY: Cambridge University Press, 2012.
- (The best study of Chinese yinyang theory in English. The text also includes discussions of gender issues.)
Wang, Robin R. Images of Women in Chinese Thought and Culture: Writings from the Pre-Qin Period through the Song Dynasty. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing, 2003.
- (An excellent resource for gender issues in Chinese thought.)

Author Information

Lijuan Shen
Email: aashen@126.com
Xi’an University of Architecture and Technology
China

and

Paul D’Ambrosio
Email: pauljdambrosio@hotmail.com
East China Normal University
China

Theological Determinism

Theological determinism is the view that God determines every event that occurs in the history of the world. While there is much debate about which prominent historical figures were theological determinists, St. Augustine, Thomas Aquinas, John Calvin, and Gottfried Leibniz all seemed to espouse the view at least at certain points in their illustrious careers. Contemporary theological determinists also appeal to various biblical texts (for example Ephesians 1:11) and confessional creeds (for example the Westminster Confession of Faith) to support their view. While such arguments from authority carry significant weight within the traditions in which they are offered, another form of argument for theological determinism which has broader appeal draws on perfect being theology, or a kind of systematic thinking through the implications of the claim that God is—in the words of St. Anselm—quo maius cogitari non potest: that than which none greater can be conceived. The article below considers three such perfect being arguments for theological determinism, having to do with God’s knowledge of the future, providential governance of creation, and absolute independence. Implications of theological determinism for human freedom and divine responsibility are then discussed.

Reflection on theological determinism is both theoretically interesting and also practically important, especially for the lives of religious believers. On the one hand, for anyone who enjoys a good philosophical puzzle, thinking through the implications of this view offers the opportunity to consider whether various sets of propositions to which people sometimes ascribe—e.g. that God has exhaustive foreknowledge but that some events are not determined, or that God determines all events but that humans are culpable for their own sin—are in fact jointly consistent, and so what sort of systematic metaphysics is possible. On the other hand, whether all events in the world—and, in particular, personally significant events, such as the birth or death of a child, or the gain or loss of employment—are understood to be determined by God or not makes a significant difference to the attitudes that religious believers adopt and the decisions they make in response to such events in their own lives.

Defining Theological Determinism
Arguments for Theological Determinism
Theological Determinism and Human Freedom
Theological Determinism and Divine Responsibility for Evil
References and Further Reading

1. Defining Theological Determinism

As stated above, theological determinism is the view that God determines every event that occurs in the history of the world. What it means for God to determine an event may need some spelling out. Theological determinism is often associated with Calvinist or Reformed theology, and many proponents of Calvinism put their view in terms of the specificity of God’s decree, the efficaciousness of God’s will, or the extent of God’s providential control. John Feinberg, for example, describes his theological determinist position as that view that “God’s decree covers and controls all things” (2001, p. 504), while Paul Helm, another staunch theological determinist of the Calvinist variety, simply says that God’s providence is “extended to all that He has created” (1993, p. 39). The problem with such characterizations is that they are subject to multiple interpretations, some of whom would be affirmed by theological indeterminists. For instance, a theological indeterminist might say that God’s providence extends to all events, or that even undetermined events are controlled or decreed by God in the sense that God foresees them and allows them to occur and realizes His purposes through them.

Thus one might think it better to define theological determinism in terms of divine causation, as Derk Pereboom does when he characterizes his view as “the position that God is the sufficient active cause of everything in creation, whether directly or by way of secondary causes” (2011, p. 262). The problem here is that some thinkers who seem committed to theological determinism deny that God should be considered a cause at all, at least in any univocal sense as creatures are. Herbert McCabe, for instance, maintains that when we act freely, we are not caused to act by anyone or anything other than ourselves (1987, p. 12). This is not because McCabe thinks that our free actions are undetermined by God, but because he thinks that God is not an “existent among others,” as created causes are (1987, p. 14). Thinkers like McCabe sometimes appeal to Thomas Aquinas’ doctrine of analogy in explaining their view. According to this doctrine, as Austin Farrer explains it, God’s providential activity cannot be conceived in causal terms without “degrade[ing] it to the creaturely level and plac[ing] it in the field of interacting causalities”—the results of which can only be “monstrosity and confusion” (1967, p. 62). If the views of such Thomists are to count as versions of theological determinism, then we need a way of spelling out the view in non-causal terms.

Perhaps, then, theological determinism will have to be defined in terms of God’s decree or will or control after all; but if so, these concepts will have to be defined so as to rule out indeterministic interpretations. We might, for instance, take Feinberg’s definition of an “unconditional” decree as one “based on nothing outside of God that move[s] him to choose one thing or another” (2001, p. 527) and then characterize theological determinism as the view that God unconditionally decrees every event that occurs in the history of the world. Such a view would exclude the possibility that God merely permits some events which He foresees will happen in some circumstances but which He does not Himself determine.

2. Arguments for Theological Determinism

a. Divine Foreknowledge

One of the divine attributes that has been appealed to in arguments for theological determinism is God’s knowledge of future events, or (simple) foreknowledge. Numerous biblical passages support the idea that God knows all that the future holds, including the free choices of human beings. For instance, the New Testament records Jesus’ prophesies that Judas will betray him and that Peter will deny him three times; and in the Hebrew Bible, the psalmist declares to God, “In your book were written all the days that were formed for me, when none of them as yet existed” (Psalm 29). Furthermore, if we assume that there are truths about the future to be known (a question discussed below), then exhaustive divine foreknowledge—that is, God’s foreknowledge of every future event—may be thought to follow from considerations of perfect being theology, since to not know some truth would seem to be an imperfection.

But if God knows the future exhaustively, theological determinists argue, then all future events must be determined, directly or indirectly, by God. The reasoning they offer in support of this argument can be considered in two steps. First is the claim that for a future event e to be known at some time t (say, “in the beginning”), e must be determined at or prior to t. Otherwise, there would be no truth about e to be known at t. The second claim is that if all future events are determined from the beginning of time, they must ultimately be so by God, since nothing else existed in the beginning to determine them. This is not to say that God’s knowledge is causal, in the sense that simply by knowing something, God is the cause of that thing. Rather, proponents of this line of reasoning contend that God cannot know a proposition unless it is true; and the proposition that some event will occur cannot be true at some time, unless that event is determined by that time; but then if God knows that some event will occur when nothing but God exists, it must be God Himself who ultimately determines the event’s occurrence.

Various responses to this sort of argument, for the incompatibility of divine foreknowledge and undetermined events, have been offered in the history of theology. One popular reply first made by Boethius is to deny that God knows anything at some time, since God exists outside of time altogether and knows all things from an eternal perspective. Another response, inspired by William of Ockham, is to grant the possibility of temporal divine knowledge but deny that what God foreknows must be determined by God. Alvin Plantinga (1986), for instance, has argued that creatures can have a sort of counterfactual power over God’s past knowledge, such that they make it the case that God knows what they themselves determine.

One final, more radical response to this argument is to deny that God has exhaustive foreknowledge. Defenders of open theism, who take this route, maintain that God leaves some future events undetermined, and so does not know exactly what the future holds. This is not to say that God is not omniscient. Rather, according to some open theists, propositions about undetermined events are simply not true (or false) before those events occur; or, according to others, there are true propositions about undetermined events, but they are in principle unknowable. Either way, open theists maintain that it is not a real limitation on God not to know what it is impossible to know, and so the denial of exhaustive foreknowledge is compatible with the affirmation that God is a supremely perfect being.

None of these responses to the argument for theological determinism just described are without their critics, however. In reply to the Boethian proposal, questions have been raised about the coherence of the claim that God—a personal being who acts—exists altogether outside of time. Furthermore, the appeal to divine eternality may not even solve the problem, since a parallel argument for theological determinism can be constructed on the assumption that God knows timelessly all that the future—considered from our perspective—holds. Likewise, in reply to the Ockhamist solution, some have questioned whether there is any real distinction between counterfactual power over God’s knowledge of the past and the power to bring about the past, the latter of which seems problematic if not impossible. Finally, many philosophers reject the open theist claim that there are propositions about the future that are neither true nor false, since such a claim requires the denial of the widely accepted principle of bivalence. And the alternative open theist view, that there are true propositions about the future that are unknowable by God, seems to call into question divine omniscience. Furthermore, many theists reject open theism as unorthodox and incompatible with divine sovereignty and providential care of creation—an issue to be discussed below.

b. Divine Providence

In addition to attributing to God exhaustive foreknowledge—or knowledge of all that will happen in the future—many theists are also committed to the claim (explicitly or implicitly, in virtue of other things they believe) that God has exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals, or facts about what would happen if circumstances were different than they in fact are. One famous biblical example of such knowledge is found in the Hebrew Bible, when David consults God about a rumor he has heard:

David said, “O Lord, the God of Israel, your servant has heard that Saul seeks to come to Keilah, to destroy the city on my account. And now, will Saul come down as your servant has heard?…” The Lord said, “He will come down.” Then David said, “Will the men of Keilah surrender me and my men into the hand of Saul?” The Lord said, “They will surrender you.” (1 Samuel 23: 10-12, N.R.S.V.)

Upon hearing this news, David and his men decide to leave Keilah, and thus Saul, learning that David has left, never ends up going there himself, and the men of Keilah never have the chance to surrender David to him. Thus the truths that the Lord revealed to David are of the counterfactual sort: if David had remained in Keilah, Saul would have sought him there; and if Saul had sought him there, the men of Keilah would have surrendered David to Saul.

Some philosophers have argued that exhaustive divine knowledge of such counterfactual conditionals is essential to God’s perfection—in particular, to God’s sovereignty and providential care for creation—and that such knowledge entails theological determinism. The argument has centered on what are called “counterfactuals of freedom,” or those counterfactual conditionals about what a possible created person (who may or may not ever exist) would freely do in a possible circumstance (which may or may not ever occur). The free actions in question are supposed to be libertarian, or those that are not determined, either by a prior state of the world or by God. Luis de Molina considered knowledge of such counterfactuals to be part of God’s scientia media, or middle knowledge, standing in between God’s “natural knowledge,” or knowledge of God’s own nature and the necessary truths that follow from it, and “free knowledge,” or knowledge of God’s will and the contingent truths that follow from it. Molina claimed that, like the propositions included in God’s natural knowledge, counterfactuals of freedom are pre-volitional, or (logically) prior to, and thus independent of, God’s will; though like the propositions included in God’s free knowledge, they are contingent truths.

One way to reconstruct the line of reasoning from divine knowledge of counterfactual conditionals to theological determinism is thus as follows:

If there are any events in the history of the world that are not determined by God, then—contra Molina—God cannot have exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals.
If God lacks exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals, then God take risks with creation.
A God who takes risks with creation is not perfect.
Therefore, since God is perfect, God must determine every event in the history of the world.

Robert Adams has argued in favor of the first premise, focusing in particular on the possibility of God’s knowledge of counterfactuals of freedom. Adams contends that for God to know a proposition, it must have a truth-value; but counterfactuals of freedom lack truth-values, since there is nothing that could ground their truth. While the consequent of a conditional may follow from the antecedent by logical or causal necessity, neither sort of necessity can ground the truth of a conditional about how a person would act if placed in a particular circumstance, if that action is undetermined. And features of a person that do not necessitate her action—such as her particular beliefs and desires—cannot ground the truth of counterfactual conditionals about her action, precisely because such features are non-necessitating. Adams suggests that divine foreknowledge may not face the same grounding problem as middle knowledge, since categorical predictions about undetermined events “can be true by corresponding to the actual occurrence of the event that they predict” (1987, p. 80). But in the case of counterfactual conditionals, there may never be actual events to which the propositions correspond.

Supposing Adams is right that middle knowledge is impossible, what would divine providence look like without it, on the assumption that God does not determine some events in the world? One might think that all God really needs to providentially govern the world is foreknowledge. Yet William Hasker has argued “foreknowledge without middle knowledge—simple foreknowledge—does not offer the benefits for the doctrine of providence that its adherents have sought to derive from it” (1989, p. 19). His reasoning, in brief, is that foreknowledge is about what will actually happen in the world God has created, and so will be useless to God in deciding what to create to begin with or how to arrange events throughout history for the benefit of creatures. Consider, for example, the biblical case discussed above, in which David consults God to determine the best strategy for avoiding capture by Saul. If God had only simple foreknowledge and not middle knowledge, then God could only tell David what he would in fact do, and what Saul’s response would in fact be, and not what better or worse outcomes might result from alternative courses of action. Likewise—and perhaps more worrisome—before creating the world, God could not know without middle knowledge whether, if He gave creatures the libertarian freedom to decide whether to enter a loving relationship with Him and their fellow creatures, any of them would indeed choose to do so. Thus, creating a world with such indeterministic events is risky business for God. In contrast, the view in which God determines all events of the world can be considered a risk-free view of providence.

While Hasker goes on to defend the risky view of providence, others have criticized it as inconsistent with divine perfection. Edwin Curley (2003) has argued that it involves a kind of recklessness inconsistent with the providential wisdom and concern for creatures that is supposed to be characteristic of a perfect Creator. Focusing in particular on indeterminism at the level of human action, Curley points out that a God who gave creatures libertarian freedom without knowing how they would use it would run the risk of their destroying themselves and thwarting God’s purposes for creation. Thomas Flint similarly argues for the superiority of the risk-free view of providence by means of a parental analogy. Imagine, he says, that a parent has two options for her child: under Option One, the child may struggle and seem to be in danger, but the parent will “know with certainty that she will freely develop into a good and happy human being who leads a full and satisfying life”; under Option Two, in contrast, the parent will have no idea how things will turn out for the child, and can only hope for the best. Flint says he would, without hesitation, choose Option One, and that the claim that Option Two is preferable is “just short of absurd” (1998, p. 106). Likewise, he suggests, the claim that a risk-taking God is superior to, or even on par with, a risk-avoiding one is incredible.

If the above line of reasoning is correct, then it follows that a supremely perfect God would not create a world in which events were left undetermined. However, the argument has been questioned on a number of points. With respect to Adams’ argument against the possibility of middle knowledge, at least two assumptions are open to doubt. First, it is unclear whether, for a proposition to have truth-value, there must be something that grounds its truth. Francisco Suárez, an early follower of Molina, seemed to question this claim. Richard Gaskin has as well, maintaining that there is nothing that grounds the truth of any proposition, and that to suppose otherwise “is to slide into a substantial and implausible correspondence theory of truth” (1993, pp. 424-425).

Others, granting that true propositions may need grounding, have proposed possible grounds for counterfactuals of freedom. Alvin Plantinga, for instance, has suggested a parallel between counterfactuals of freedom and propositions about past events. He writes: “Suppose… that yesterday I freely performed some action A. What was or is it that grounded or founded my doing so?… Perhaps you will say that what grounds [the truth of the proposition that I did A] is just that in fact I did A” (1985, p. 378). Plantinga responds that the same kind of answer is available in the case of counterfactuals of freedom; for what grounds such truths is the fact that certain people (actual or possible) are such that if they were put in certain circumstances, they would do certain things.

Other theists who accept that God lacks exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals question whether this entails that God lacks the sort of providential control over creation essential to His perfection. David Hunt has argued, contra Hasker, that simple foreknowledge can in fact give God a “providential advantage,” allowing Him to “secure results” that He would not be able to secure without such knowledge (2009). If with simple foreknowledge God can thus ensure His central purposes for creation, perhaps the charge that theological indeterminism entails risk-taking with respect to less significant outcomes will not have so much sting.

Alternatively, one may argue with open theists that the risky view of providence involves divine virtues such as experimentation, collaboration, responsiveness, and vulnerability, and that it is the only way to secure the great metaphysical and moral value of creatures with libertarian freedom. One way to put this latter point is in terms of Flint’s parental analogy. After noting that he would of course choose (risk-free) Option One if he could, Flint says, “the fact that we don’t have a choice here, that we as parents are stuck with [risky] Option Two, is one of the things that is especially frustrating (and even terrifying) about being a parent” (1998a, p. 106). An open theist convinced of the impossibility of middle knowledge might respond that this must similarly be what is especially frustrating (and even terrifying!) about being God—that Option One is not available, so that if God wants to create persons with libertarian freedom, He must opt for Option Two. But just as a parent still chooses to give birth to a child, so God still chooses to bring into being such creatures, because of their great value.

c. Divine Aseity

A third argument for theological determinism focuses on the divine attribute of aseity. The word aseity which comes from the Latin phrase a se—“from itself”—refers to God’s absolute independence from anything distinct from Himself. While some have taken divine aseity to be the most fundamental feature of our conception of God, others have suggested that it follows from God’s perfection, since to be dependent on another would seem to be an imperfection (Brower 2011). Closely related to the concept of divine aseity is the medieval conception of God as pure act (actus purus). What medieval thinkers meant by saying that God is pure act is that He is always complete in Himself—always “all that He can be.” In contrast, in created beings there is potentiality and passivity, meaning that they are not all that they can be, but can be changed and acted on by others.

On the basis of considerations of God’s aseity and pure actuality, Reginald Garrigou-Lagrange has offered an argument for theological determinism. For, he says, those who maintain that there are some events that God does not determine—for instance, human choices—must posit “a passivity in the pure Act. If the divine causality is not predetermining with regard to our choice… the divine knowledge is fatally determined by it. To wish to limit the universal causality and absolute independence of God, necessarily brings one to place a passivity in Him” (1936, p. 538). To illustrate his point, Garrigou-Lagrange asks us to imagine that when God gives two men grace to fight temptation, one cooperates with this grace while the other does not, but that the difference between their responses is not determined by God. Supposing that God can foreknow the two men’s responses to His grace, theological indeterminists must admit that “the foreknowledge is passive,” just as a person’s knowledge is passive when she is a mere spectator to some event (1936, pp. 538-539). What Garrigou-Lagrange seems to mean by this suggestive phrasing is that God’s intellect would be passive, in the sense that in coming to know what the two men will do, God’s intellect would be acted upon by something outside of it. Garrigou-Lagrange concludes:

God is either determining or determined, there is no other alternative. His knowledge of free conditional futures is measured by things, or else it measures them by reason of the accompanying decree of the divine will. Our salutary choices, as such, in the intimacy of their free determination, depend upon God, or it is He, the sovereignly independent pure Act, who depends upon us. (1936, p. 546)

In response to this argument for theological determinism, Eleonore Stump contends that the dilemma presented by Garrigou-Lagrange—that God either determines or is determined—is a false one, if determination is taken to be equivalent to causation. She offers examples of both divine and human knowledge in which the knower neither determines what she knows, nor is determined by it. On the human side, a person might know that an animal is a substance, but the human obviously does not determine this truth. And (on Thomas Aquinas’ view of human cognition—which Garrigou-Lagrange would presumably accept) neither is the human rendered passive, or determined in her knowledge of this truth, since the human intellect’s operations are active in the process of deriving it, and nothing acts on the intellect “with causal efficacy” in this process. Likewise, on the divine side, God presumably knows of His own existence without determining that He exists; but neither, presumably, is God determined in His knowledge of this truth (2003, pp. 120-121).

One thing to note about the examples offered by Stump—of a human knowing that an animal is a substance, or of God knowing that He exists—is that the truths known are in both cases necessary. One question that a theological determinist might raise is whether, when it comes to knowledge of contingent events, the indeterminist can likewise maintain that the knower neither determines nor is determined by what she knows. While our coming to know necessary truths on the basis of, say, complex mathematical reasoning would seem to be quite an active process, our coming to know contingent truths on the basis of some very clear and distinct perception—say, that we have hands—would seem to be more passive. If this is right, then the theological determinist might maintain that if God’s knowledge of undetermined future events is quasi-perceptual, then God might indeed be rendered passive by such knowledge. Furthermore, even if the theological indeterminist can defend a conception of divine foreknowledge on which God is not determined by some of what He knows, in the sense that He is not caused to know some truths, it is very hard to see how He would not in some sense be dependent on something outside of Himself for that knowledge. The question for theological indeterminists is whether this sense of dependency is compatible with a conception of God as supremely perfect.

3. Theological Determinism and Human Freedom

So far we have considered arguments that theological determinists have put forward in support of their view of divine providence, as well as some objections raised to these arguments. Critics of theological determinism not only object to the positive reasons offered in favor of the view, but also to certain negative implications. One major issue theological determinists must grapple with is how there can be any creaturely freedom in a world in which all events are determined by God. The claim that at least some creatures are both free and responsible for their actions is a central part of traditional Western theisms—Judaism, Christianity, and Islam—and most contemporary theological determinists affirm this claim, though as we will see, some within these traditions dissent from it. Below, several theological deterministic conceptions of human freedom are discussed.

a. Standard Compatibilism

Perhaps the most common conception of free will espoused by theological determinists is the standard compatibilist one: that determinism of any sort—whether theological (that is, determination by God) or natural (that is, determination by antecedent events in accordance with the laws of nature)–does not automatically rule out free will. Theological determinists espousing this view often appeal to secular theories of freedom and arguments for the compatibility of such freedom with natural determinism to support their claim that theological determinism is also compatible with free will. For instance, according to the classic compatibilist position defended by Thomas Hobbes, a person is free to the extent that she finds no impediment to doing what she wants or wills to do.

Contemporary compatibilists, recognizing the limitations of this position—for example that it allows for actions resulting from brainwashing to be free—have offered various refinements, such as that, in addition to being able to do what one wants or wills to do, one must act with sensitivity to certain rational considerations (the reasons-responsive view), or one must have the will one wants to have (the hierarchical model). One proponent of the latter view is Lynn Rudder Baker. According to Baker, “Person S has compatibilist free will for a choice or action if:

S wills X,
S wants to will X,
S wills X because she wants to will X, and
S would still have willed X even if she (herself) had known the provenance of her wanting to will X.” (2003, p. 467)

Baker notes that her account is compatibilist in the sense that “a person S’s having free will with respect to an action (or choice) A is compatible with A’s being caused ultimately by factors outside of S’s control.” She makes no distinction, with respect to the question of an agent’s freedom, whether the agent’s action is caused “by God or by natural events” (2003, pp. 460-461). More generally, theological determinists point out that on all such contemporary compatibilist accounts of free will, divine determination does not automatically rule out human freedom, since none of these accounts specifies what must be true of the first causes of human volition and action. This lack of specificity, however, is precisely the problem that incompatibilists—those who hold that determinism of any sort is incompatible with determinism—find with the compatibilist position. They reason that if either God or events of the distant past are the ultimate causes of our actions, then our actions are not under our control. The debate between compatibilists and incompatibilists has a long history, and is ongoing. See “Free Will” for a more in-depth summary.

b. Theological-but-not-Natural Compatibilism

While many theological determinists take the standard compatibilist line, some differentiate between natural and theological determinism, and maintain that only the latter is compatible with free will. Defenders of this position, who might be called “theological-but-not-natural-compatibilists,” appeal to a number of differences between theological and natural determinism to support their view. Hugh McCann, for instance, argues that in contrast to the way in which events that we bring about come to pass, “the manner in which our actions come to pass is not one in which God acts upon us or does anything to us” (2005, p. 145). McCann maintains that God’s causing our actions is like an author’s creating the characters of a novel. He writes: “The author of a novel never makes her creatures do something; she only makes them doing it. It is the same between us and God” (2005, p. 146).

McCann should not be interpreted as denying theological determinism here—that is, as saying that God does not determine what creatures do, but only what they are. Rather, he means that, unlike creatures who can only make other creatures do things, God has the unique ability to make creatures themselves; and rather than first bringing creatures into being, and then making them do certain things, God by one and the same act makes creatures doing the things they do. McCann contends that because of such differences between divine and creaturely causation, theological determinism “does not endanger our freedom” as natural determinism does (2005, p. 146).

However, theological compatibilism, like its natural counterpart, has been criticized by standard incompatibilists. One of the most influential arguments for the incompatibility of causal determinism and human freedom—the Consequence argument—relies on the premise that, in a deterministic world, the ultimate causes of our actions are events of the distant past. The reason why this is considered a problem, though, is simply that such causes lie outside of our control. So if the Consequence argument establishes the incompatibility of free will and natural determinism, a parallel argument appealing to the fact that God’s will, taken as a determining cause, likewise lies outside of our control should establish the incompatibility of free will and theological determinism. To put the point differently, it seems that those who hold that God’s determination of our actions is both causal, and compatible with human freedom, ought to be standard compatibilists about determinism and free will, rather than theological-but-not-natural compatibilists, since the differentiating features of natural determining causes pose no additional threat to free will, once one accepts that God’s determining causation is compatible with human freedom.

c. Libertarianism

While the theological determinists described above, who maintain that theological determinism is compatible with human freedom while natural determinism is not, suggest various differences between divine and natural determination, they still recognize God’s determination as a species of causation. As mentioned already, however, some who seem to espouse theological determinism deny that God should be considered a cause at all, at least in any univocal sense as creatures are. Writing in this tradition, Michael Hoonhout applauds Aquinas for intentionally discussing the doctrine of divine providence twice in his Summa Theologiae—first in the context of “the essence of God” and then in the context of “the nature of creation”—in recognition of “two radically different orders of intelligibility.” He maintains that “double affirmations which seemingly contradict each other are to be expected” if we respect the integrity of each order (2002, pp. 4-6).

The seemingly contradictory “double affirmations” to which Hoonhout refers are that God determines everything that occurs in the world, and that humans have a non-deterministic form of freedom. Thus one finds some theologians who seem clearly committed to theological determinism when considering the order of the Creator, speaking of the possibility of libertarian human freedom in the context of the order of creation. Kathyrn Tanner, for instance, maintains a view of divine causation as absolute in terms of both its range (“all inclusive or universally extensive”) and its efficacy (“cannot be hindered, diverted, or otherwise redirected by creatures”). Tanner claims that since “God does not bring about the human agent’s choice by intervening in the created order as some sort of supernatural cause,” one can “still affirm a very strong libertarian version of the human being’s freedom” (1994, pp. 113, 125, 126).

The trouble with such a view, however, is that it seems to face a dilemma. On the one hand, if the way in which God determines events in the world is really nothing like the way creaturely causes do, such that even fundamental concepts like conditional necessity do not apply to the relationship between God’s causal activity and its effects, then, as Thomas Tracy points out (1994), analogy collapses into equivocation, and we are left without any idea of what theological determinism is supposed to mean. On the other hand, if such fundamental concepts do apply to divine causation in something like the way they apply to creaturely causation, then arguments against the compatibility of theological determinism and human freedom must be considered and responded to, rather than simply dismissed as involving a confusion of categories.

d. Hard Determinism

One final position that theological determinists may adopt on the issue of human freedom is the standard incompatibilist one, admitting that determinism of any sort is incompatible with free will and thus that there can be no creaturely freedom. This view, called hard theological determinism, has historically won few adherents, in part because of the centrality of the belief in human freedom to so much civic and religious life. On the civic side, the assumption of free will has been thought to underwrite reactive attitudes such as resentment, indignation, gratitude, and love, and the moral and legal practices of praise and blame, reward and punishment. On the religious side, human freedom has seemed crucial to the logic of divine commandment and judgment, and to such reactive attitudes and practices as guilt, repentance, and forgiveness.

However, some hard theological determinists have challenged such assumptions about the centrality of free will. Derk Pereboom, for instance, has argued that, while theological determinism is not compatible with the basic sense of desert (that is, deserving praise or blame simply because of the moral status of what one has done) it is compatible with judgments of value (for example, that behavior is good or bad), as well as the reactive attitudes and practices which are most central to traditional theism, and which might seem to presuppose basic desert. For instance, a person without free will might still recognize that she has failed to act according to the principles she believes she should live by, and so experience guilt; or, she might resolve to no longer hold another’s past behavior as a reason to remain at odds with him, and so forgive. Pereboom suggests that God’s commanding and judging, rewarding and punishing may serve the moral formation of creatures even without free will, and so may be justified without it. However, some critics have questioned whether such religiously significant attitudes and practices as repentance and the resolution to amend one’s life can really be secured without a sense of either basic desert or the sort of agential control which hard theological determinists deny. Furthermore, even if hard theological determinism is compatible with such attitudes and practices central to theistic traditions, it is another question whether the denial of free will and moral responsibility in the basic-desert sense is itself compatible with the teachings of these religions. One question that remains for hard Christian determinists, for example, is how to make sense of the many New Testament passages that discuss the freedom found in Christ (cf. Galatians 5:1, 2 Corinthians 3:17).

4. Theological Determinism and Divine Responsibility for Evil

Besides explaining how, on their view, humans can be free and responsible for their own actions (or how the denial of human freedom is compatible with traditional theism), theological determinists must also face questions about God’s moral responsibility for the evil in the world that, on their view, He determines. As with the former issue, their responses to the latter are many and varied. Below a number of distinct responses are discussed.

a. Theodicies and Defenses

Some theists attempt to offer a theodicy, or plausible explanation of why God has created a world in which evil exists. Others, uncertain of what God’s actual reasons are, propose instead a defense, or possible explanation. One historic and popular explanation of why evil exists in a world created by God is the free will defense, first proposed by St. Augustine and developed by Alvin Plantinga (1974). According to this defense, the evil we witness in God’s creation is not in fact God’s doing at all, but the result of humans’ misuse of their own freedom: God created humans to live in harmony with Himself and each other, but they freely chose to rebel against God and to sin against one another. Some proponents of this defense extend it to explain natural as well as moral evil, suggesting that all suffering in the world is ultimately due to sinful choices of fallen creatures, some of which lie behind the destructive natural forces of the world. However, the free will defense seems to assume that it was impossible for God both to create free persons and to determine all of their actions, such that they never do evil. In other words, it seems to assume an indeterministic conception of human freedom incompatible with theological determinism. Thus, the traditional free will defense would not seem to be an option for theological determinists.

Some compatibilists have argued, however, that the free will defense need not presuppose an indeterministic conception of human freedom. Jason Turner, for instance, suggests that if “free actions can be determined but must not be dependent on another’s will”—a view he calls “independent compatibilism”—then the free will defense may still be open to theological determinists (2003, p. 131). On independent compatibilism, whether God could create a world with free persons who were determined in their actions and never committed moral evil depends on whether God would create such a world because the persons never committed evil, or for some other reason. Supposing that the reason God would create a world in which persons who were determined in their actions never committed moral evil was indeed because they never committed evil, their actions would be dependent on God’s will, and so would not be free.

While there thus may be some versions of the free will defense open to the theological determinist, such versions require metaphysical assumptions that may seem implausible—for instance, that events in the causal history of an agent’s action occurring before she was even born may determine whether her (determined) actions are free or not, and that whether an event depends on God’s will in a freedom-undermining way depends on what God’s reasons were for causing it. Still, theological determinists may argue that even the traditional indeterministic version of the free will defense is implausible, and that more plausible explanations of evil are available. John Hick, for instance, contends that, given a modern understanding of evolutionary theory, the claim that humans were created perfect and fell from grace is an incredible one. Inspired by the writings of St. Irenaeus, Hick proposes instead the soul-making theodicy, according to which God created imperfect creatures in a world in which they are prone to suffering and sin. He argues that it is not the freedom of creatures, per se, which is so valuable as to outweigh these evils, but rather their development, morally and spiritually, through struggle, suffering, trial and temptation, and the virtuous characters which result from “the investment of costly personal effort” (2010, p. 256). While Hick is himself committed to theological indeterminism, his basic theodicy is compatible with theological determinism as well.

Two other theodicies that theological determinists have adopted likewise focus on the value of development or process. Eleonore Stump has suggested that a world of sin and suffering is “most conducive” to bringing about both humans’ willingness to receive the gift of salvation from God and also their subsequent sanctification (1985, p. 409). While Stump holds that human freedom is incompatible with theological (and natural) determinism, and that receiving the gift of salvation and undergoing the process of sanctification both require free will, Derk Pereboom contends that “no feature of [her] account demands libertarian freedom, nor even a notion of free will of the sort required for moral responsibility… It is sufficient that this change [the turning to God on the occasion of suffering] is seriously valuable, and that it results in more intimate relationship with God” (2015). Marilyn McCord Adams, likewise, has proposed that participating in evil might facilitate creatures’ identification with Christ and union with God (1999). Such work on theodicy has drawn on specifically Christian conceptions of God and the human good, and advanced them in innovative ways. Yet, these proposals raise many questions about the value of process—developing moral character, becoming sanctified, or coming to identify with God—as well as the comparative value of such processes with the disvalue of the sin and suffering that make them possible.

b. Causing vs. Permitting Evil

Even supposing the disvalue of all sin and suffering in the world is outweighed by the value of the moral development of creatures, another concern critics have raised is whether it is morally permissible for God to cause humans to sin in order to realize some good. Peter Byrne, in response to Paul Helm’s deterministic theodicy, asks:

How does it square with the Pauline injunction that one should not do evil that good may come of it? The place of that injunction in traditional moral theology is to set limits to how far we can pursue good by way of doing evil as its precondition. There are some acts that are so heinous that one may not do them for the sake of the bringing about a greater good…. One may not murder that good may come of it. But Helm’s God has precisely planned, purposed, and necessitated acts of murder and instances of other kinds of horrendous wickedness so that good may come of them. (2008, p. 200)

In response, some theological determinists have argued that the difference between God’s causing humans to commit sin for the purpose of realizing some good (the theological determinist’s view), and knowing that humans would sin if they were created in particular circumstances and choosing to create them in those circumstances anyway, for the purpose of realizing some good (the Molinist view), is morally insignificant. Indeed, theological determinists contend, even the open theist’s view, according to which God allows horrendous evil that He could prevent—presumably for the purpose of realizing some good—raises similar questions about God’s moral responsibility for evil. So, they maintain, this concern about divine responsibility should not be a reason to reject theological determinism in favor of such competing views of divine providence.

c. God not a Moral Agent

While some theological determinists offer theodicies or defenses in attempt to demonstrate that there is some actual or possible reason for evil which morally justifies God in creating it, others eschew such explanations altogether. Some argue that they are unnecessary, on the grounds God cannot, in principle, be morally responsible for anything, since He is above or beyond morality altogether. One line of argument for this conclusion is based on the idea that morality depends on God’s will and command, and that God is not Himself subject to the commandments that He establishes. Morality, on this view, only applies to creatures, over which God has ultimate moral authority. One problem facing such a divine command theory of morality is the familiar Euthyphro problem—that if God’s commandments determine the content of morality, then morality is arbitrary, such that what is right might have been wrong and vice versa if God had willed that it be so. Another implication of this argument that many theists find difficult to accept is that, if God cannot in principle be morally blameworthy since He is above morality, then He cannot be morally praiseworthy either.

d. Sin not Blameworthy

An alternative response to the question of how God could not be blameworthy for causing humans to sin is the hard theological determinist one. As discussed above, hard theological determinists maintain that, since God causes all events in creation, humans are not free or morally responsible in the basic desert sense. As Derk Pereboom notes, it follows on this view that since humans are not blameworthy for their actions, God is not the cause of blameworthy actions. Thus, God’s causing human sin is more similar to His causing natural evils, such as animal predation and its associated sufferings, than it is to His causing moral evils, traditionally understood. Since most theists agree that God has control over all such natural forces, the problem of natural evil poses no more difficulty for the theological determinist than for the theological indeterminist. However, this hard deterministic response to the problem of moral evil is compatible with the offering of a theodicy or defense particular to human sin, as well as with the appeal to skeptical theism discussed below.

e. Skeptical Theism

One final response to the problem of evil that theological determinists make is to admit that they are unable to think of reasons that would justify God in creating a world with the sort and extent of evil that we see, but nevertheless to maintain that such an inability should not be taken as good evidence that there is no divine justification for evil. This is the response offered by skeptical theists, so named because of their skepticism about their own ability to discern God’s reasons for creating and governing the world as He does. Several lines of reasoning have been offered for this position, ranging from arguments from analogy, likening the cognitive distance between us and God to that between a very young child and her parents, to arguments focusing on the massive complexity of the causal networks in the world, and our inability to comprehend how actual and possible goods and evils are connected. The view has also been subject to various objections, regarding purported negative implications of the view for theological knowledge and trust in God, and moral deliberation and action. The debate regarding these issues is ongoing, and the interested reader should see Skeptical Theism for more information.

While skeptical theism is a response to the problem of evil available to theological determinists and indeterminists alike, theological determinists who embrace the view must grapple with further issues. Like those offering a theodicy or defense, theological determinists who maintain their justified ignorance of God’s reasons must still come to terms with the fact that, on their view, evil is not merely permitted but determined by God. This would seem to lead to a sort of double-mindedness specifically about the value of moral evil in the world. It is, after all, central to religious practice to strive to see the events in one’s life from God’s perspective, and to value them as God would, in His wisdom and benevolence. Thus, if some horrendous evil—say, severe child abuse—is divinely determined, then one ought to strive to accept, and even embrace it as instrumental to God’s purposes and so for the greater good. Such an attempt, however, would seem to be in serious tension with a teaching central to the traditional theism, that moral evil is opposed by God, and should be opposed by humans as well.

5. References and Further Reading

Adams, Marilyn McCord (1999). Horrendous Evils and the Goodness of God. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains proposal that experience of evil might facilitate humans’ identification with Christ and union with God.
Adams, Robert (1987). “Middle Knowledge and the Problem of Evil.” The Virtue of Faith and Other Essays in Philosophical Theology. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Raises grounding objection against the possibility of middle knowledge.
Baker, Lynn Rudder (2003). “Why Christians Should Not Be Libertarians: An Augustinian Challenge.” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 20 No. 4, pp. 460-478.
- Argues for compatibilism on the basis of tradition, and offers standard compatibilist account of free will.
Basinger, David and Randall Basinger (1986). Predestination and Free Will: Four Views of Divine Sovereignty and Human Freedom. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
- Contains discussion of how embracing theological determinism might shape one’s personal deliberations and decision-making.
Boethius (1969). The Consolation of Philosophy. Trans. V. E. Watts. New York: Penguin Books.
- Contains proposal of divine timelessness as resolution to the problem of divine foreknowledge and human freedom.
Brower, Jeffrey (2011). “Simplicity and Aseity.” The Oxford Handbook of Philosophical Theology. Ed. Flint, Thomas and Michael Rea. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Defines aseity and summarizes argument for theological determinism on the basis of aseity.
Byrne, Peter (2008). “Helm’s God and the Authorship of Sin.” Reason, Faith and History: Philosophical Essays for Paul Helm. Ed. M. W. F. Stone. Burlington, VT: Ashgate.
- Raises concern that Helm’s theological determinism commits him to the claim that God “plans, purposes, and values moral evil.”
Curley, Edwin (2003). “The Incoherence of Christian Theism.” The Harvard Review of Philosophy, Vol. 11, pp. 74-100.
- Contains argument that the risky view of providence is incompatible with divine wisdom and care for creation.
Farrer, Austin (1967). Faith and Speculation. London: A. and C. Black.
- Explicates the doctrine of analogy and its implications for the “paradox” of divine agency and human freedom.
Feinberg, John S. (2001). No One Like Him. Wheaton, IL: Crossway Books.
- Defends theological determinism on biblical, theological, and philosophical grounds, and responds to a number of objections to the view.
Flint, Thomas (1998). Divine Providence: The Molinist Account. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains argument for superiority of the risk-free over the risky view of providence.
Gaskin, Richard (1993). “Conditionals of Freedom and Middle Knowledge.” The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 43, No. 173, pp. 412-430.
- Argues against claim that counterfactuals of freedom need grounds.
Garrigou-Lagrange, R. (1936). God, His Existence and His Nature: A Thomistic Solution of Certain Agnostic Antinomies, Vol. 2. Trans. Rose, Dom Bebe. London: B. Herder Book Co.
- Contains argument for theological determinism on the basis of God’s aseity.
Hasker, William (1985). “Foreknowledge and Necessity,” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 2 No. 2, pp. 121-156.
- Criticizes Plantinga’s distinction between counterfactual power over the past and the power to bring about the past.
Hasker, William (1989). God, Time and Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains argument that simple foreknowledge is providentially useless to God.
Helm, Paul (1993). The Providence of God. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
- Contains arguments for the “risk-free” view of providence on the basis of divine knowledge and goodness.
Hick, John (2010). Evil and the God of Love. New York: Harper and Row.
- Contains explication and defense of the soul-making theodicy.
Hoonhout, Michael (2002). “Grounding Providence in the Theology of the Creator: The Exemplarity of Thomas Aquinas.” The Heythrop Journal, Vol. 43, No. 1, pp. 1-19.
- Defends Aquinas’ seemingly contradictory “double affirmations” of divine causation and human freedom.
Hunt, David (2009). “The Providential Advantage of Divine Foreknowledge.” Arguing about Religion. Ed. Timpe, Kevin. New York: Routledge, pp. 374-385.
- Argues that simple foreknowledge enables God to secure results that He would not be able to secure without it.
McCann, Hugh (2005). “The Author of Sin?” Faith and Philosophy Vol. 22. No. 2, pp. 144-159.
- Argues that theological determinism does not endanger human freedom, as natural determinism does, and that God cannot do moral wrong, since morality is grounded in divine commands.
Pereboom, Derk (2011). “Theological Determinism and Divine Providence.” Molinism: The Contemporary Debate. Ed. Ken Perszyk. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 262-280.
- Defends compatibility of hard theological determinism and traditional theism.
Pereboom, Derk (2015). “Libertarianism and Theological Determinism.” Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns. Ed. Timpe, Kevin and Dan Speak. Under contract with Oxford University Press.
- Offers response to the problem of evil compatible with hard theological determinism.
Plantinga, Alvin (1974). God, Freedom, and Evil. Grand Rapids, MI: Eerdmans.
- Develops a free will defense.
Plantinga, Alvin (1985). “Reply to Robert M. Adams.” Alvin Plantinga (Profiles. Vol. 5). Ed. Tomberlin, James and Peter van Inwagen. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, pp. 371-382.
- Contains proposal of possible grounds for counterfactuals of freedom.
Plantinga, Alvin (1986). “On Ockham’s Way Out.” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 3 No. 3, pp. 235–269.
- Defends claim that humans have counterfactual power over God’s past knowledge.
Rogers, Katherin (2000). Perfect Being Theology. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
- Considers implications of the description of God as “that than which none greater can be conceived.”
Stump, Eleonore (1985). “The Problem of Evil.” Faith and Philosophy Vol. 2 No. 4, pp. 392-423.
- Contains proposal that sin and suffering facilitate human acceptance of saving grace and process of sanctification.
Stump, Eleonore (2003). Aquinas. New York: Routledge.
- Contains response to argument for theological determinism on the basis of divine aseity.
Tanner, Kathryn (1994). “Human Freedom, Human Sin, and God the Creator.” The God Who Acts: Philosophical and Theological Explorations. Ed. Thomas Tracy. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, pp. 111-135.
- Argues for the compatibility of universal divine causation and libertarian human freedom.
Tracy, Thomas (1994). “Divine Action, Created Causes, and Human Freedom.” The God Who Acts: Philosophical and Theological Explorations. Ed. Thomas Tracy. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, pp. 77-102.
- Contains critique of attempt to hold together theological determinism and libertarian human freedom.
Turner, Jason (2013). “Compatibilism and the Free Will Defense.” Faith and Philosophy. Vol. 30, No. 2, pp. 125-137.
- Offers version of free will defense compatible with theological determinism.
Vicens, Leigh (2012). “Divine Determinism, Human Freedom, and the Consequence Argument.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 71:2, pp. 145-155.
- Argues that if natural determinism is incompatible with human freedom, so is theological determinism.
Zagzebski, Linda (2011). “Eternity and Fatalism.” God, Eternity, and Time. Ed. Christian Tapp. Aldershot: Ashgate Press.
- Argues that appeals to divine timelessness do not solve the problem of how divine foreknowledge is compatible with our ability to do otherwise. A parallel point can be made about the problem of how divine foreknowledge is compatible with indeterminism.

Author Information

Leigh Vicens
Email: lvicens@augie.edu
Augustana College
U. S. A.

Locke: Ethics

The major writings of John Locke (1632–1704) are among the most important texts for understanding some of the central currents in epistemology, metaphysics, politics, religion, and pedagogy in the late 17^th and early 18^th century in Western Europe. His magnum opus, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1689) is the undeniable starting point for the study of empiricism in the early modern period. Locke’s best-known political text, Two Treatises of Government (1693) criticizes the political system according to which kings rule by divine right (First Treatise) and lays the foundation for modern liberalism (Second Treatise). His Letter Concerning Toleration (1689) argues that much civil unrest is borne of the state trying to prevent the practice of different religions. In this text, Locke suggests that the proper domain of government does not include deciding which religious path the people ought to take for salvation—in short, it is an argument for the separation of church and state. Some Thoughts Concerning Education (1693) is a very influential text in early modern Europe that outlines the best way to rear children. It suggests that the virtue of a person is directly related to the habits of body and the habits of mind instilled in them by their educators.

Although these texts enjoy a status of “must-reads,” Locke’s views on ethics or moral philosophy have nowhere near the same high status. The reason for this is, in large part, that Locke never wrote a text devoted to the topic. This omission is surprising given that several of his friends entreated him to set down his thoughts about ethics. They saw that the scattered remarks that Locke makes about morality here and there throughout his works were, at times, quite provocative and in need of further development and defense. But, for reasons unknown to us, Locke never indulged his friends with a more systematic moral philosophy. It is thus up to his readers to stitch together his fragmented remarks about happiness, moral laws, freedom, and virtue in order to see what kind of moral philosophy is woven through the texts and to determine whether it is a coherent position.

Introduction
The Good
1. Pleasure and Pain
2. Happiness
The Law of Nature
Power, Freedom, and Suspending Desire
Living the Moral Life
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

While Locke did not write a treatise devoted to a discussion of ethics, there are strands of discussion of morality that weave through many, if not most, of his works. One such strand is evident near the end of his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (hereafter: Essay) where he states that one of the most important aspects of improving our knowledge is to recognize the kinds of things that we can truly know. With this recognition, he says, we are able to finely-tune the focus of our enquiries for optimal results. And, he concludes, given the natural capacities of human beings, “Morality is the proper Science, and Business of Mankind in general” because human beings are both “concerned” and “fitted to search out their Summum Bonum [highest good]” (Essay, Book IV, chapter xii, section 11; hereafter: Essay, IV.xii.11). This claim indicates that Locke takes the investigation of morality to be of utmost importance and gives us good reason to think that Locke’s analysis of the workings of human understanding in general is intimately connected to discovering how the science proper to humankind is to be practiced. The content of the knowledge of ethics includes information about what we, as rational and voluntary agents, ought to do in order to obtain an end, in particular, the end of happiness. It is the science, Locke says, of using the powers that we have as human beings in order to act in such a way that we obtain things that are good and useful for us. As he says: ethics is “the seeking out those Rules, and Measures of humane Actions, which lead to Happiness, and the Means to practice them” (Essay, IV.xxi.3). So, there are several elements in the landscape of Locke’s ethics: happiness or the highest good as the end of human action; the rules that govern human action; the powers that command human action; and the ways and means by which the rules are practiced. While Locke lays out this conception of ethics in the Essay, not all aspects of his definition are explored in detail in that text. So, in order to get the full picture of how he understands each element of his description of ethics, we must often look to several different texts where they receive a fuller treatment. This means that Locke himself does not explain how these elements fit together leaving his overarching theory somewhat of a puzzle for future commentators to contemplate. But, by mining different texts in this way, we can piece together the details of an ethical theory that, while not always obviously coherent, presents a depth and complexity that, at minimum, confirms that this is a puzzle worth trying to solve.

2. The Good

a. Pleasure and Pain

The thread of moral discussion that weaves most consistently throughout the Essay is the subject of happiness. True happiness, on Locke’s account, is associated with the good, which in turn is associated with pleasure. Pleasure, in its turn, is taken by Locke to be the sole motive for human action. This means that the moral theory that is most directly endorsed in the Essay is hedonism.

On Locke’s view, ideas come to us by two means: sensation and reflection. This view is the cornerstone of his empiricism. According to this theory, there is no such thing as innate ideas or ideas that are inborn in the human mind. All ideas come to us by experience. Locke describes sensation as the “great source” of all our ideas and as wholly dependent on the contact between our sensory organs and the external world. The other source of ideas, reflection or “internal sense,” is dependent on the mind’s reflecting on its own operations, in particular the “satisfaction or uneasiness arising from any thought” (Essay, II.i.4). What’s more, Locke states that pleasure and pain are joined to almost all of our ideas both of sensation and of reflection (Essay, II.vii.2). This means that our mental content is organized, at least in one way, by ideas that are associated with pleasure and ideas that are associated with pain. That our ideas are associated with pains and pleasures seems compatible with our phenomenal experience: the contact between the sense organ of touch and a hot stove will result in an idea of the hot stove annexed by the idea of pain, or the act of remembering a romantic first kiss brings with it the idea of pleasure. And, Locke adds, it makes sense to join our ideas to the ideas of pleasure and pain because if our ideas were not joined with either pleasure of pain, we would have no reason to prefer the doing of one action over another, or the consideration of one idea over another. If this were our situation, we would have no reason to act—either physically or mentally (Essay, II.viii.3). That pleasure and pain are given this motivational role in action entails that Locke endorses hedonism: the pursuit of pleasure and the avoidance of pain are the sole motives for action.

Locke notes that among all the ideas that we receive by sensation and reflection, pleasure and pain are very important. And, he notes that the things that we describe as evil are no more than the things that are annexed to the idea of pain, and the things that we describe as good are no more than the things that are annexed to the idea of pleasure. In other words, the presence of good or evil is nothing other than the way a particular idea relates to us—either pleasurably or painfully. This means that on Locke’s view, good is just the category of things that tend to cause or increase pleasure or decrease pain in us, and evil is just the category of things that tend to cause or increase pain or decrease pleasure in us (Essay, II.xx.2). Now, we might think that, morally speaking, this way of defining good and evil gets Locke into trouble. Consider the following scenario. Smith enjoys breaking her promises. In other words, failing to honor her word brings her pleasure. According to the view just described, it seems that breaking promises, at least for Smith, is a good. For, if good and evil are defined as nothing more than pleasure and pain, it seems that if something gives Smith pleasure, it is impossible to deny that it is a good. This would be an unwelcome effect of Locke’s view, for it would indicate that his system leads directly to a kind of moral relativism. If promise breaking is pleasurable for Smith and promise keeping is pleasurable for her friend Jones and pleasure is the sign of the good, then it seems that the good is relative and there is no sense in which we can say that Jones is right about what is good and Smith is wrong. Locke blocks this kind of consequence for his view by introducing a distinction between “happiness” and “true happiness.” This indicates that while all things that bring us pleasure are linked to happiness, there is also a category of pleasure-bringing things that are linked to true happiness. It is the pursuit of the members of this special category of pleasurable things that is, for Locke, emblematic of the correct use of our intellectual powers.

b. Happiness

Locke is very clear—we all constantly desire happiness. All of our actions, on his view, are oriented towards securing happiness. Uneasiness, Locke’s technical term for being in a state of pain and desirous of some absent good, is the motive that moves us to act in the way that is expected to relieve the pain of desire and secure the state of happiness (Essay, II.xxi.36). But, while Locke equates pleasure with good, he is careful to distinguish the happiness that is acquired as a result of the satisfaction of any particular desire and the true happiness that is the result of the satisfaction of a particular kind of desire. Drawing this distinction allows Locke to hold that the pursuit of a certain sets of pleasures or goods is more worthy than the pursuit of others.

The pursuit of true happiness, according to Locke, is equated with “the highest perfection of intellectual nature” (Essay, II.xxi.51). And, indeed, Locke takes our pursuit of this true happiness to be the thing to which the vast majority of our efforts should be oriented. To do this, he says that we need to try to match our desires to “the true instrinsick good” that is really within things. Notice here that Locke is implying that there is distinction to be drawn between the “true intrinsic good” of a thing and, it seems, the good that we unreflectively take to be within a certain thing. The idea here is that attentively considering a particular thing will allow us to see its true value as opposed to the superficial value we assign to a thing based on our immediate reaction to it. We can think, for example, of a bitter tasting medicine. A face-value assessment of the medicine will lead us to evaluate that the thing is to be avoided. However, more information and contemplation of it will lead us to see that the true worth of the medicine is, in fact, high and so it should be evaluated as a good to be pursued. And, Locke states, if we contemplate a thing long enough, and see clearly the measure of its true worth; we can change our desire and uneasiness for it in proportion to that worth (Essay, II.xxi.53). But how are we to understand Locke’s suggestion that there is a true, intrinsic good in things? So far, all he has said about the good is that it is tracked by pleasure. We begin to get an answer to this question when Locke acknowledges the obvious fact that different people derive pleasure and pain from different things. While he reiterates that happiness is no more than the possession of those things that give the most pleasure and the absence of those things that cause the most pain, and that the objects in these two categories can vary widely among people, he adds the following provocative statement:

If therefore Men in this Life only have hope; if in this Life they can only enjoy, ’tis not strange, nor unreasonable, that they should seek their Happiness by avoiding all things, that disease them here, and by pursuing all that delight them; wherein it will be no wonder to find variety and difference. For if there be no Prospect beyond the Grave, the inference is certainly right, Let us eat and drink, let us enjoy what we delight in, for tomorrow we shall die [Isa, 22:13; I Cor. 15:32]. (Essay, II.xxi.55)

Here, Locke suggests that pursuing and avoiding the particular things that give us pleasure or pain would be a perfectly acceptable way to live were there “no prospect beyond the grave.” It seems that what Locke means is that if there were no judgment day, which is to say that if our actions were not ultimately judged by God, there would be no reason to do otherwise than to blindly follow our pleasures and flee our pains. Now, given this suggestion, the question, then, is how to distinguish between the things that are pleasurable but that will not help our case on judgment day, and those that will. Locke provides a clue for how to do such a thing when he says that the will is typically determined by those things that are judged to be good by the understanding. However, in many cases we use “wrong measures of good and evil” and end by judging unworthy things to be good. He who makes such a mistake errs because “[t]he eternal Law and Nature of things must not be alter’d to comply with his ill order’d choice” (Essay, II.xxi.56). In other words, there is an ordered way to choose which things to pursue—the things that are in accordance with the eternal law and nature of things—and an ill-ordered way, in accordance with our own palates. This indicates that Locke takes there to be a fixed law that determines which things are worthy of our pursuit, and which are not. This means that Locke takes there to be an important distinction between the good, understood as all objects that are connected to pleasure and the moral good, understood as objects connected to pleasure which are also in conformity with a law. Though the distinctions between good and moral good, and between evil and moral evil are not discussed in any great detail by Locke, he does states that moral good and evil is nothing other than the “Conformity or Disagreement of our voluntary Actions to some Law.” Locke states punishments and rewards are bestowed on us for our following or failure to follow this law by “the Will and Power of the Law-maker” (Essay, II.xxviii.5). So, Locke affirms that moral good and evil are closely tied to the observance or violation of some law, and that the lawmaker has the power to reward or punish those who adhere to or stray from the law.

3. The Law of Nature

a. Existence

In the Essay, the concepts of laws and lawmakers do not receive much treatment beyond Locke’s affirmation that God has decreed laws and that there are rewards and punishments associated with the respect or violation of these laws (Essay, I.iii.6; I.iii.12; II.xxi.70; II.xxviii.6). The two most important questions concerning the role of laws in a system of ethics remain unanswered in the Essay: (1) how do we determine the content of the law? This is the epistemological question. And (2) what kind of authority does the law have to obligate? This is the moral question. Locke spends much time considering these questions in a series of nine essays written some thirty years before the Essay, which are known under the collected title Essays on the Law of Nature (hereafter: Law).

The first essay in the series treats the question of whether there is a “rule of morals, or law of nature given to us.” The answer is unequivocally “yes” (Law, Essay I, page 109; hereafter: Law, I: 109). The reason for this positive answer, in short, is because God exists. Locke appeals to a kind of teleological argument to support the claim of God’s existence, saying that given the organization of the universe, including the organized way in which animal and vegetable bodies propagate, there must be a governing principle that is responsible for the patterns we see on earth. And, if we extend this principle to the existence of human life, Locke claims that it is reasonable to believe that there is a pattern or a law that governs behavior. This law is to be understood as moral good or virtue and, Locke states, it is the decree of God’s will and is discernable by “the light of nature.” Because the law tells us what is and is not in conformity with “rational nature,” it has the status of commanding or prohibiting certain behaviors (Law, I: 111; see also Essay, IV.xix.16). Because all human beings possess, by nature, the faculty of reason, all human beings, at least in principle, can discover the natural law.

Locke offers five reasons for thinking that such a natural law exists. He begins by noting that it is evident that there is some disagreement among people about the content of the law. However, far from thinking that such disagreement casts doubt on the existence of the law, he takes the presence of disagreement about the law as evidence that such a true and objective law exists. Disagreements about the content of the law confirm that everyone is in agreement about the fundamental character of the law—that there are things that are by their nature good or evil—but just disagree about how to interpret the law (Law, I: 115). The existence of the law is further reinforced by the fact that we often pass judgment on our own actions, by way of our conscience, leading to feelings of guilt or pride. Because it is not possible, according to Locke, to pronounce a judgment without the existence of a law, the act of conscience demonstrates that such a natural law exists. Third, again appealing to a kind of teleological argument, Locke states that we see that laws govern all manner of natural operations and that it makes sense that human beings would also be governed by laws that are in accordance with their nature (Law, I: 117). Fourth, Locke states that without the natural law, society would not be able to run the way that it does. He suggests that the force of civil law is grounded on the natural law. In other words, without the natural law, positive law would have no moral authority. Elsewhere, Locke underlines this point by saying that given that the law of nature is the eternal rule for all men, the rules made by legislators must conform to this law (The Two Treatises of Government, Treatise II, section 135, hereafter: Government, II.35). Finally, on Locke’s view, there would be no virtue or vice, no reward or punishment, no guilt, if there were no natural law (Law, I: 119). Without the natural law, there would be no bounds on human action. This means that we would be motivated only to do what seems pleasurable and there would be no sense in which anyone could be considered virtuous or vicious. The existence of the natural law, then, allows us to be sensitive to the fact that there are certain pleasures that are more in line with what is objectively right. Indeed, Locke also gestures towards, but does not elaborate on, this kind of thought in the Essay. He suggests that the studious man, who takes all his pleasures from reading and learning will eventually be unable to ignore his desires for food and drink. Likewise, the “Epicure,” whose only interest is in the sensory pleasures of food and drink, will eventually turn his attention to study when shame or the desire to “recommend himself to his Mistress” will raise his uneasiness for knowledge (Essay, II.xxi.43).

So, Locke has given us five reasons to accept the existence of the law of nature that grounds virtuous and vicious behavior. We turn now to how he thinks we come to know the content of the law.

b. Content

Locke suggests that there are two ways to determine the content of the law of nature: by the light of nature and by sense experience.

Locke is careful to note that by “light of nature” he does not mean something like an “inward light” that is “implanted in man” and like a compass constantly leads human beings towards virtue. Rather, this light is to be understood as a kind of metaphor that indicates that truth can be attained by each of us individually by nothing more than the exercise of reason and the intellectual faculties (Law, II: 123). Locke uses a comparison to precious metal mining to make this point clear. He acknowledges that some might say that his explanation of the discovery of the content of the law by the light of nature entails that everyone should always be in possession of the knowledge of this content. But, he notes, this is to take the light of nature as something that is stamped on the hearts on human beings, which is a mistake (see Law, III, 137-145). While the depths of the earth might contain veins of gold and silver, Locke says, this does not mean that everyone living on the stretch of land above those veins is rich (Law, II: 135). Work must be done to dig out the precious metals in order to benefit from their value. Similarly, proper use must be made of the faculties we have in order to benefit from the certainty provided by the light of nature. Locke notes that we can come to know the law of nature, in a way, by tradition, which is to say by the testimony and instruction of other people. But it is a mistake to follow the law for any reason other than that we recognize its universal binding force. This can only be done by our own intellectual investigation (Law, II: 129).

But what, exactly, is the light of nature? Locke acknowledges that it is difficult to answer this question—it is not something stamped on the heart or mind, nor is it something that is exclusively learned by tradition or testimony. The only option left for describing it, then, is that it is something acquired or experienced by sense experience or by reason. And, indeed, Locke suggests that when these two faculties, reason and sensation, work together, nothing can remain obscure to the mind. Sensation provides the mind with ideas and reason guides the faculty of sensation and arranges “together the images of things derived from sense-perception, thence forming others [ideas] and composing new ones” (Law, IV: 147). Locke emphasizes that reason ought to be taken to mean “the discursive faculty of the mind, which advances from things known to thinks unknown,” using as its foundation the data provided by sense experience (Law, IV: 149).

When directly addressing the question of how the combination of reason and sense experience allow us to know the content of the law of nature, Locke states that two important truths must be acknowledged because they are “presupposed in the knowledge of any and every law” (Law, IV: 151). First, we must understand that there is a lawmaker who decreed the law, and that the lawmaker is rightly obeyed as a superior power (a discussion of this point is also found in Government, I.81). Second, we must understand that the lawmaker wishes those to whom the law is decreed to follow the law. Let us take each of these in turn.

Sense experience allows us to know that a lawmaker exists. To demonstrate this, Locke appeals, once again, to a kind of teleological argument: by our senses we come to know the objects external world and, importantly, the regularities with which they move and change. We also see that we human beings are part of the movements and changes of the external world. Reason, then, contemplates these regularities and orders of change and motion and naturally comes to inquire about their origin. The conclusion of such an inquiry, states Locke, is that a powerful and wise creator exists. This conclusion follows from two observations: (1) that beasts and inanimate things cannot be the cause of the existence of human beings because they are clearly less perfect than human beings, and something less perfect cannot bring more perfect things into existence, and 2) that we ourselves cannot be the cause of our own existence because if we possessed the power to create ourselves, we would also have the power to give ourselves eternal life. Because it is obviously the case that we do not have eternal life, Locke concludes that we cannot be the origin of our own existence. So, Locke says, there must be a powerful agent, God, who is the origin of our existence (Law, IV: 153). The senses provide the data from the external world, and reason contemplates the data and concludes that a creator of the observed objects and phenomena must exist. Once the existence of a creator is determined, Locke thinks that we can also see that the creator has “a just and inevitable command over us and at His pleasure can raise us up or throw us down, and make us by the same commanding power happy or miserable” (Law, IV: 155). This commanding power, on Locke’s view, indicates that we are necessarily subject to the decrees of God’s will. (A similar line of discussion is found in Locke’s The Reasonableness of Christianity, 144–46.)

As for the second truth, that the lawmaker, God, wishes us to follow the laws decreed, Locke states that once we see that there is a creator of all things and that an order obtains among them, we see that the creator is both powerful and wise. It follows from these evident attributes that God would not create something without a purpose. Moreover, we notice that our minds and bodies seem well equipped for action, which suggests, “God intends man to do something.” And, the “something” that we are made to do, according to Locke, is the same purpose shared by all created things—the glorification of God (Law, IV: 157). In the case of rational beings, Locke states that given our nature, our function is to use sense experience and reason in order to discover, contemplate, and praise God’s creation; to create a society with other people and to work to maintain and preserve both oneself and the community. And this, in fact, is the content of the law of nature—to preserve one’s own being and to work to maintain and preserve the beings of the other people in our community. This injunction to preserve oneself and to preserve one’s neighbors is also endorsed and stressed throughout Locke’s discussions of political power and freedom (see Government, I.86, 88, 120; II.6, 25, 128).

c. Authority

Once we have knowledge of the content of the law of nature, we must determine from where it derives its authority. In other words, we must ask why we are bound to follow the law once we are aware of its content. Locke begins this discussion by reiterating that the law of nature “is the care and preservation of oneself.” Given this law, he states that virtue should not be understood as a duty but rather the “convenience” of human beings. In this sense, the good is nothing more than what is useful. Further, he adds, the observance of this law is not so much an obligation but rather “a privilege and an advantage, to which we are led by expediency” (Law, VI: 181). This indicates that Locke thinks that actions that are in conformity with the law are useful and practical. In other words, it is in our best interest to follow the law. While this characterization of why we in fact follow the law is compelling, there is nevertheless still an inquiry to be made into why we ought to follow the law.

Locke begins his treatment of this question by stating that no one can oblige us to do anything unless the one who obliges has some superior right and power over us. The obligation that is generated between such a superior power and those who are subject to it results in two kinds of duties: (1) the duty to pay obedience to the command of the superior power. Because our faculties are suited to discover the existence of the divine lawmaker, Locke takes it to be impossible to avoid this discovery, barring some damage or impediment to our faculties. This duty is ultimately grounded in God’s will as the force by which we were created (Law, VI: 183). (2) The duty to suffer punishment as a result of the failure to honor the first duty—obedience. Now, it might seem odd that it would be necessary to postulate that punishment results from the failure to respect a law the content of which is only that we must take care of ourselves. In other words, how could anyone express so little interest in taking care of himself or herself that the fear of punishment is needed to motivate the actions necessary for such care? It is worth quoting Locke’s answer in full:

[A] liability to punishment, which arises from a failure to pay dutiful obedience, so that those who refuse to be led by reason and to own that in the matter of morals and right conduct they are subject to a superior authority may recognize that they are constrained by force and punishment to be submissive to that authority and feel the strength of Him whose will they refuse to follow. And so the force of this obligation seems to be grounded in the authority of a lawmaker, so that power compels those who cannot be moved by warnings. (Law, VI: 183)

So, even though the existence, content, and authority of the law of nature are known in virtue of the faculties possessed by all rational creatures—sense experience and reason—Locke recognizes that there are people who “refuse to be led by reason.” Because these people do not see the binding force of the law by their faculties alone, they need some other impetus to motivate their behavior. But, Locke thinks very ill of those who are in need of this other impetus. He says the these features of the law of nature can be discovered by anyone who is diligent about directing their mind to them, and can be concealed from no one “unless he loves blindness and darkness and casts off nature in order that he may avoid his duty” (Law, VI: 189, see also Government, II.6).

d. Reconciling the Law with Happiness

The main lines of Locke’s natural law theory are as follows: there is a moral law that is (1) discoverable by the combined work of reason and sense experience, and (2) binding on human beings in virtue of being decreed by God. Now, in §1 above, we saw that Locke thinks that all human beings are naturally oriented to the pursuit of happiness. This is because we are motivated to pursue things if they promise pleasure and to avoid things if they promise pain. It has seemed to many commentators that these two discussions of moral principles are in tension with each other. On the view described in Law, Locke straightforwardly appeals to reason and our ability to understand the nature of God’s attributes to ground our obligation to follow the law of nature. In other words, what is lawful ought to be followed because God wills it and what is unlawful ought to be rejected because it is not willed by God. Because we can straightforwardly see that God is the law-giver and that we are by nature subordinate to Him, we ought to follow the law. By contrast, in the discussion of happiness and pleasure in the Essay, Locke explains that good and evil reduce to what is pleasurable and what is painful. While he does also indicate that the special categories of good and evil—moral good and moral evil—are no more than the conformity or disagreement between our actions and a law, he immediately adds that such conformity or disagreement is followed by rewards or punishments that flow from the lawmaker’s will. From this discussion, then, it is difficult to see whether Locke holds that it is the reward and punishment that binds human beings to act in accordance with the law, or if it is the fact that the law is willed by God.

One way to approach this problem is to suggest that Locke changed his mind. Because of the thirty-year gap between Law and the Essay, we might be tempted to think that the more rationalist picture, where the law and its authority are based on reason, was the young Locke’s view when he wrote Law. This view, the story would go, was replaced by Locke’s more considered and mature view, hedonism. But this approach must be resisted because both theories are present in early and late works. The role of pleasure and pain with respect to morality is present not only in the Essay, but is invoked in Law (passage quoted at the end of §2c), and many other various minor essays written in the years between Law and Essay (for example, ‘Morality’ (c.1677–78) in Political Essays, 267–69). Likewise, the role of the authority of God’s will is retained after Law, again evident in various minor essays (for example, ‘Virtue B’ (1681) in Political Essays, 287-88), Government II.6), Locke’s correspondence (for example, to James Tyrrell, 4 August 1690, Correspondence, Vol.4, letter n.1309) and even in the Essay itself (II.xxviii.8). An answer to how we might reconcile these two positions is suggested when we consider the texts where appeals to both theories are found side-by-side in certain passages.

In his essay Of Ethick in General (c. 1686–88) Locke affirms the hedonist view that happiness and misery consist only in pleasure and pain, and that we all naturally seek happiness. But in the very next paragraph, he states that there is an important difference between moral and natural good and evil—the pleasure and pain that are consequences of virtuous and vicious behavior are grounded in the divine will. Locke notes that drinking to excess leads to pain in the form of headache or nausea. This is an example of a natural evil. By contrast, transgressing a law would not have any painful consequences if the law were not decreed by a superior lawmaker. He adds that it is impossible to motivate the actions of rational agents without the promise of pain or pleasure (Of Ethick in General, §8). From these considerations, Locke suggests that the proper foundation of morality, a foundation that will entail an obligation to moral principles, needs two things. First, we need the proof of a law, which presupposes the existence of a lawmaker who is superior to those to whom the law is decreed. The lawmaker has the right to ordain the law and the power to reward and punish. Second, it must be shown that the content of the law is discoverable to humankind (Of Ethick in General, §12). In this text it seems that Locke suggests that both the force and authority of the divine decree and the promise of reward and punishment are necessary for the proper foundation of an obligating moral law.

A similar line of argument is found in the Essay. There, Locke asserts that in order to judge moral success or failure, we need a rule by which to measure and judge action. Further, each rule of this sort has an “enforcement of Good and Evil.” This is because, according to Locke, “where-ever we suppose a Law, suppose also some Reward or Punishment annexed to that Law” (Essay, II.xxviii.6). Locke states that some promise of pleasure or pain is necessary in order to determine the will to pursue or avoid certain actions. Indeed, he puts the point even more strongly, saying that it would be in vain for the intelligent being who decrees the rule of law to so decree without entailing reward or punishment for the obedient or the unfaithful (see also Government, II.7). It seems, then, that reason discovers the fact that a divine law exists and that it derives from the divine will and, as such, is binding. We might think, as Stephen Darwall suggests in The British Moralists and the Internal Ought, that if reason is that which discovers our obligation to the law, the role for reward and punishment is to motivate our obedience to the law. While this succeeds in making room for both the rationalist and hedonist strains in Locke’s view, some other texts seem to indicate that by reason alone we ought to be motivated to follow moral laws.

One striking instance of this kind of suggestion is found in the third book of the Essay where Locke boldly states that “Morality is capable of Demonstration” in the same way as mathematics (Essay, III.xi.16). He explains that once we understand the existence and nature of God as a supreme being who is infinite in power, goodness, and wisdom and on whom we depend, and our own nature “as understanding, rational Beings,” we should be able to see that these two things together provide the foundation of both our duty and the appropriate rules of action. On Locke’s view, with focused attention the measures of right and wrong will become as clear to us as the propositions of mathematics (Essay, IV.iii.18). He gives two examples of such certain moral principles to make the point: (1) “Where there is no Property, there is no Injustice” and (2) “No Government allows absolute Liberty.” He explains that property implies a right to something and injustice is the violation of a right to something. So, if we clearly see the intensional definition of each term, we see that (1) is necessarily true. Similarly, government indicates the establishment of a society based on certain rules, and absolute liberty is the freedom from any and all rules. Again, if we understand the definitions of the two terms in the proposition, it becomes obvious that (2) is necessarily true. And, Locke states, following this logic, 1 and 2 are as certain as the proposition that “a Triangle has three Angles equal to two right ones” (Essay, IV.iii.18). If moral principles have the same status as mathematical principles, it is difficult to see why we would need further inducement to use these principles to guide our behavior. While there is no clear answer to this question, Locke does provide a way to understand the role of reward and punishment in our obligation to moral principles despite the fact that it seems that they ought to obligate by reason alone.

Early in the Essay, over the course of giving arguments against the existence of innate ideas, Locke addresses the possibility of innate moral principles. He begins by saying that for any proposed moral rule human beings can, with good reason, demand justification. This precludes the possibility of innate moral principles because, if they were innate, they would be self-evident and thus would not be candidates for justification. Next, Locke notes that despite the fact that there are no innate moral principles, there are certain principles that are undeniable, for example, that “men should keep their Compacts.” However, when asked why people follow this rule, different answers are given. A “Hobbist” will say that it is because the public requires it, and the “Leviathan” will punish those who disobey the law. A “Heathen” philosopher will say that it is because following such a law is a virtue, which is the highest perfection for human beings. But a Christian philosopher, the category to which Locke belongs, will say that it is because “God, who has the Power of eternal Life and Death, requires it of us” (Essay, I.iii.5). Locke builds on this statement in the following section when he notes that while the existence of God and the truth of our obedience to Him is made manifest by the light of reason, it is possible that there are people who accept the truth of moral principles, and follow them, without knowing or accepting the “true ground of Morality; which can only be the Will and Law of God” (Essay, I.iii.6). Here Locke is suggesting that we can accept a true moral law as binding and follow it as such, but for the wrong reasons. This means that while the Hobbist, the Heathen, and the Christian might all take the same law of keeping one’s compacts to be obligating, only the Christian does it for the right reason—that God’s will requires our obedience to that law. Indeed, Locke states that if we receive truths by revelation they too must be subject to reason, for to follow truths based on revelation alone is insufficient (see Essay, IV.xviii).

Now, to determine the role of pain and pleasure in this story, we turn to Locke’s discussion of the role of pain and pleasure in general. He says that God has joined pains and pleasures to our interaction with many things in our environment in order to alert us to things that are harmful or helpful to the preservation of our bodies (Essay, II.vii.4). But, beyond this, Locke notes that there is another reason that God has joined pleasure and pain to almost all our thoughts and sensations: so that we experience imperfections and dissatisfactions. He states that the kinds of pleasures that we experience in connection to finite things are ephemeral and not representative of complete happiness. This dissatisfaction coupled with the natural drive to obtain happiness opens the possibility of our being led to seek our pleasure in God, where we anticipate a more stable and, perhaps, permanent happiness. Appreciating this reason why pleasure and pain are annexed to most of our ideas will, according to Locke, lead the way to the ultimate aim of the enquiry in human understanding—the knowledge and veneration of God (Essay, II.vii.5–6). So, Locke seems to be suggesting here that pain and pleasure prompt us to find out about God, in whom complete and eternal happiness is possible. This search, in turn, leads us to knowledge of God, which will include the knowledge that He ought to be obeyed in virtue of His decrees alone. Pleasure and pain, reward and punishment, on this interpretation, are the means by which we are led to know God’s nature, which, once known, motivates obedience to His laws. This mechanism supports Locke’s claim that real happiness is to be found in the perfection of our intellectual nature—in embarking on the search for knowledge of God, we embark on the intellectual journey that will lead to the kind of knowledge that brings permanent pleasure. This at least suggests that the knowledge of God has the happy double-effect of leading to both more stable happiness and the understanding that God is to be obeyed in virtue of His divine will alone.

But given that all human beings experience pain and pleasure, Locke needs to explain how it is that certain people are virtuous, having followed the experience of dissatisfaction to arrive at the knowledge of God, and other people are vicious, who seek pleasure and avoid pain for no reason other than their own hedonic sensations.

4. Power, Freedom, and Suspending Desire

a. Passive and Active Powers

In any discussion of ethics, it is important not only to determine what, exactly, counts as virtuous and vicious behavior, but also the extent to which we are in control of our actions. This is important because we want to be able to adequately connect behavior to agents in order to attribute praise or blame, reward or punishment to an agent, we need to be able to see the way in which she is the causal source of her own actions. Locke addresses this issue in one of the longest chapters of the Essay—“Of Power.” In this chapter, Locke describes how he understands the nature of power, the human will, freedom and its connection to happiness, and, finally, the reasons why many (or even most) people do not exercise their freedom in the right kind of way and are unhappy as a result. It is worth noting here that this chapter of the Essay underwent major revisions throughout the five editions of the Essay and in particular between the first and second edition. The present discussion is based on the fourth edition of the Essay (but see the “References and Further Reading” below for articles that discuss the relevance of the changes throughout all five editions).

Locke states that we come to have the idea of “power” by observing the fact that things change over time. Finite objects are changed as a result of interactions with other finite objects (for example fire melts gold) and we notice that our own ideas change either as a result of external stimulus (for example the noise of a jackhammer interrupts the contemplation of a logic problem) or as a result of our own desires (for example hunger interrupts the contemplation of a logic problem). The idea of power always includes some kind of relation to action or change. The passive side of power entails the ability to be changed and the active side of power entails the ability to make change. Our observation of almost all sensible things furnishes us with the idea of passive power. This is because sensible things appear to be in almost constant flux—they are changed by their interaction with other sensible things, with heat, cold, rain, and time. And, Locke adds, such observations give us no fewer instances of the idea of active power, for “whatever Change is observed, the Mind must collect a Power somewhere, able to make that Change” (Essay, II.xxi.4). However, when it comes to active powers, Locke states that the clearest and most distinct idea of active power comes to us from the observation of the operations of our own minds. He elaborates by stating that there are two kinds of activities with which we are familiar: thinking and motion. When we consider body in general, Locke states that it is obvious that we receive no idea of thinking, which only comes from a contemplation of the operations of our own minds. But neither does body provide the idea of the beginning of motion, only of the continuation or transfer of motion. The idea of the beginning of motion, which is the idea associated with the active power of motion, only comes to us when we reflect “on what passes in our selves, where we find by Experience, that barely by willing it, barely by a thought of the Mind, we can move the parts of our Bodies, which were before at rest” (Essay, II.xxi.4). So, it seems, the operation of our minds, in particular the connection between one kind of thought, willing, and a change in either the content of our minds or the orientation of our bodies, provides us with the idea of an active power.

b. The Will

The power to stop, start, or continue an action of the mind or of the body is what Locke calls the will. When the power of the will is exercised, a volition (or willing) occurs. Any action (or forbearance of action) that follows volition is considered voluntary. The power of the will is coupled with the power of the understanding. This latter power is defined as the power of perceiving ideas and their agreement or disagreement with one another. The understanding, then, provides ideas to the mind and the will, depending on the content of these ideas, prefers certain courses of action to others. Locke explains that the will directs action according to its preference—and here we must understand “preference” in the most general sense of inclination, partiality, or taste. In short, the will is attracted to actions that promise the procurement of pleasing things and/or the distancing from displeasing things. The technical term that Locke uses to describe that which determines the will is uneasiness. He elaborates, stating that the reason why any action is continued is “the present satisfaction in it” and the reason why any action is taken to move to a new state is dissatisfaction (Essay, II.xxi.29). Indeed, Locke affirms that uneasiness, at bottom, is really no more than desire, where the mind is disturbed by a “want of some absent good” (Essay, II.xxi.31). So, any pain or discomfort of the mind or body is a motive for the will to command a change of state so as to move from unease to ease. Locke notes that it is a common fact of life that we often experience multiple uneasinesses at one time, all pressing on us and demanding relief. But, he says, when we ask the question of what determines the will at any one moment, the answer is the most pressing uneasiness (Essay, II.xxi.31). Imagine a situation where you are simultaneously experiencing discomfort as a result of hunger and the anxiety of being under-prepared for tomorrow’s philosophy exam. On Locke’s view the most intense or the most pressing of these uneasinesses will determine your will to command the action that will relieve it. This means that no matter how much you want to stay at the library to study, if hunger comes to be the more pressing than the desire to pass the exam, hunger will determine the will to act, commanding the action that will result in the procurement of food.

While Locke states that the most pressing uneasiness determines the will, he adds that it does so “for the most part, but not always.” This is because he takes the mind to have the power to “suspend the execution and satisfaction of any of its desires” (Essay, II.xxi.47). While a desire is suspended, Locke says, our mind, being temporarily freed from the discomfort of the want for the thing desired, has the opportunity to consider the relative worth of that thing. The idea here is that with appropriate deliberation about the value of the desired thing we will come to see which things are really worth pursuing and which are better left alone. And, Locke states, the conclusion at which we arrive after this intellectual endeavor of consideration and examination will indicate what, exactly, we take to be part of our happiness. And, in turn, by a mechanism that Locke does not describe in any detail, our uneasiness and desire for that thing will change to reflect whether we concluded that the thing does, indeed, play a role in our happiness or not (Essay, II.xxi.56). The problem is that there is no clear explanation for how, exactly, the power to suspend works. Despite this, Locke nowhere indicates that suspension is an action of the mind that is determined by anything other than volition of the will. We know that Locke takes all acts of the will to be determined by uneasiness. So, suspending our desires must be the result of uneasiness for something. Investigating how Locke understands human freedom and judgment will allow us to see what, exactly, we are uneasy for when we are determined to suspend our desires.

c. Freedom

When the nature of the human will is under discussion, we often want to know the extent of this faculty’s freedom. The reason why this question is important is because we want to see how autonomously the will can act. Typically, the question takes the form of: is the will free? Locke unequivocally denies that the will is free, implying, in fact, that it is a category mistake to ask the question at all. This is because, on his view, both the will and freedom are powers of agents, and it is a mistake to think that one power (the will) can have as a property a second power (freedom) (Essay, II.xxi.20). Instead, Locke thinks that the right question to pose is whether the agent is free. He defines freedom in the following way:

[T]he Idea of Liberty, is the Idea of a Power in any Agent to do or forbear any particular Action, according to the determination or thought of the mind, whereby either of them is preferr’d to the other; where either of them is not in the Power of the Agent to be produced by him according to his Volition here he is not a Liberty, that Agent is under Necessity. (Essay, II.xxi.8)

So, Locke considers that an agent is free in acting when her action is connected to her volition in the right kind of way. That is, when her action (or forbearance of action) follows from her volition, she is free. And, her volition is determined by the “thought of the mind” that indicates which action is preferred.

Notice here that Locke takes an agent to be free in acting when she acts according to her preference—this means that her actions are determined by her preference. This plainly shows that Locke does not endorse a kind of freedom of indifference, according to which the will can choose to command an action other than the thing most preferred at a given moment. This is the kind of freedom most often associated with indeterminism. Freedom, then, for Locke, is no more than the ability to execute the action that is taken to result in the most pleasure at a given moment. The problem with this way of defining freedom is that it seems unable to account for the kinds of actions we typically take to be emblematic of virtuous or vicious behavior. This is because we tend to think that the power of freedom is a power that allows us to avoid vicious actions, perhaps especially those that are pleasurable, in order to pursue a righteous path instead. For instance, on the traditional Christian picture, when we wonder about why God would allow Adam to sin, the response given is that Adam was created as a free being. While God could have created beings that, like automata, unfailingly followed the good and the true, He saw that it was all things considered better to create beings that were free to choose their own actions. This decision was made despite the fact that God foresaw the sinful use to which this freedom would be put. This traditional view explains Adam’s sin in the following way: Adam knew that it was God’s commandment that he was not to eat of the tree of knowledge. Adam also knew that following God’s commandment was the right thing to do. So, in the moment where he was tempted to eat the fruit of the tree of knowledge, he knew it was the wrong thing to do, but did it anyway. This is because, the story goes, and in that moment he was free to decide whether to follow the commandment or to give in to temptation. Of his own free choice, Adam decided to follow temptation. This means that in the moment of original sin, both following God’s commandment and eating the fruit were live options for Adam, and he chose the fruit of his own agency.

Now, on Locke’s system, a different explanation obtains. Given his definition of freedom, it is difficult, at least prima facie, to see how Adam could be blamed for choosing the fruit over the commandment. For, according to Locke, an agent acts freely when her actions are determined by her volitions. So, if Adam’s greatest uneasiness was for the fruit, and the act of eating the fruit was the result of his will commanding such action based on his preference, then he acted freely. But, on this understanding of freedom, it is difficult to see how, exactly, Adam can be morally blamed for eating the fruit. The question now becomes: is Adam to be blamed for anticipating more pleasure from the consumption of the fruit than from following God’s command? In other words, was it possible for Adam to alter the intensity of his desire for the fruit? It seems that on Locke’s view, the answer must be connected to one of the powers he takes human beings to possess—the power to suspend desires. And, in certain passages of the Essay, Locke implies that suspending desires and freedom are linked, suggesting that while agents are acting freely whenever their volitions and actions are linked in the right kind of way, there is, perhaps, a proper use of the power to act freely.

d. Judgment

Locke asserts that the “highest perfection of intellectual nature” is the “pursuit of true and solid happiness.” He adds that taking care not to mistake imaginary happiness for real happiness is “the necessary foundation of our liberty.” And, he writes that the more closely we are focused on the pursuit of true happiness, which is our greatest good, the less our wills are determined to command actions to pursue lesser goods that are not representative of the true good (Essay, II.xxi.51). In other words, the more we are determined by true happiness, the more we will to suspend our desires for lesser things. This suggests that Locke takes there to be a right way to use our power of freedom. Locke indicates that there are instances where it is impossible to resist a particular desire—when a violent passion strikes, for instance. He also states, however, that aside from these kinds of violent passions, we are always able to suspend our desire for any thing in order to give ourselves the time and the emotional distance from the thing desired in which to consider the worth of thing relative to our general goal: true happiness. True happiness, or real bliss, on Locke’s view, is to be found in the pursuit of things that are true intrinsic goods, which promise “exquisite and endless Happiness” in the next life (Essay, II.xxi.70). In other words, true good is something like the Beatific Vision.

Now, Locke admits that it is a common experience to be carried by our wills towards things that we know do not play a role in our overall and true happiness. However, while he allows that the pursuit of things that promise pleasure, even if only a temporary pleasure, represents the action of a free agent, he also says that it is possible for us to be “at Liberty in respect of willing” when we choose “a remote Good as an end to be pursued” (Essay, II.xxi.56). The central thing to note here is that Locke is drawing a distinction between immediate and remote goods. The difference between these two kinds of goods is temporal. For instance, acting to obtain the pleasure of intoxication is to pursue an immediate good while acting to obtain the pleasure of health is to pursue a remote good. So, we can suppose here that Locke is suggesting that forgoing immediate goods and privileging remote goods is characteristic of the right use of liberty (but see Rickless for an alternative interpretation). If this is so, it is certainly not a difficult suggestion to accept. Indeed, it is fairly straightforwardly clear that many immediate pleasures do not, in the end, contribute to overall and long-lasting happiness.

The question now, and it is a question that Locke himself poses, is “How Men come often to prefer the worse to the better; and to chase that, which, by their own Confession, has made them miserable” (Essay, II.xxi.56). Locke gives two answers. First, bad luck can account for people not pursuing their true happiness. For instance, someone who is afflicted with an illness, injury, or tragedy is consumed by her pain and is thus unable to adequately focus on remote pleasures. Quoting Locke’s second answer “Other uneasinesses arise from our desire of absent good; which desires always bear proportion to, and depend on the judgment we make, and the relish we have of any absent good; in both which we are apt to be variously misled, and that by our own fault” (Essay, II.xxi.57).

Here Locke states that our own faulty judgment is to blame for our preferring the worse to the better. This is because, on his view, the uneasiness we have for any given object is directly proportional to the judgments we make about the merit of the things to which we are attracted. So, if we are most uneasy for immediate pleasures, it is our own fault because we have judged these things to be best for us. In this way, Locke makes room in his system for praiseworthiness and blameworthiness with respect to our desires: absent illness, injury, or tragedy, we ourselves are responsible for endorsing, through judgment, our uneasinesses. He continues, stating that the major reason why we often misjudge the value of things for our true happiness is that our current state fools us into thinking that we are, in fact, truly happy. Because it is difficult for us to consider the state of true, eternal happiness, we tend to think that in those moments when we enjoy pleasure and feel no uneasiness, we are truly happy. But such thoughts are mistaken on his view. Indeed, as Locke says, the greatest reason why so few people are moved to pursue the greatest, remote good is that most people are convinced that they can be truly happy without it.

The cause of our mistaken judgments is the fact that it is very difficult for us to compare present and immediate pleasures and pains with future or remote pleasures and pains. In fact, Locke likens this difficulty to the trouble we typically experience in correctly estimating the size of distant objects. When objects are close to us, it is easy to determine their size. When they are far away, it is much more difficult. Likewise, he says, for pleasures and pains. He notes that if every sip of alcohol were accompanied by headache and nausea, no one would ever drink. But, “the fallacy of a little difference in time” provides the space for us to mistakenly judge that the alcohol contributes to our true happiness (Essay, II.xxi.63). We experience this difficulty of judging remote pleasures and pains due to the “weak and narrow Constitution of our Minds” (Essay, II.xxi.64). The condition of our minds makes it easy for us to think that there could be no greater good than the relief of being unburdened of a present pain. In order to correct this problem and convince a man to judge that his greatest good is to be found in a remote thing, Locke says that all we must do is convince him that “Virtue and Religion are necessary to his Happiness” (Essay, II.xxi.60). Locke explains that a “due consideration will do it in most cases; and practice, application, and custom in most” (Essay, II.xxi.69). The suggestion is that contemplation and deliberation alone may be sufficient to correct our problem of considering all immediate pleasures and pains to be greater than any future ones. And, if that does not work, practice and habit can also correct this problem. By practice and exposure, we can, according to Locke, change the agreeableness or disagreeableness of things. It seems, then, that the power to suspend desire must be the power to reject immediate pleasures in favor of the pursuit of remote or future pleasures. However, it seems that in order to suspend in this way, we must already have judged that these immediate pleasures are not representative of the true good. For, without this kind of prior judgment, it seems that we would not be in a position to suspend in the way that is required. This is because absent the prior judgment, there would be no reason for the uneasiness we felt for the perceived good to not determine the will. The question to resolve now is how to get ourselves into a position where we are uneasy for the remote, true good and can suspend our desires for immediate pleasures. In other words, we must determine how we can come to seriously judge immediate pleasures to not have a part in our true happiness.

5. Living the Moral Life

In order to behave in a way that will lead us to the greatest and truest happiness, we must come to judge the remote and future good, the “unspeakable,” “infinite,” and “eternal” joys of heaven to be our greatest and thus most pleasurable good (Essay, II.xxi.37–38). But, on Locke’s view, our actions are always determined by the thing we are most uneasy about at any given moment. So, it seems, we need to cultivate the uneasiness for the infinite joys of heaven. But if, as Locke suggests, the human condition is such that our minds, in their weak and narrow states, judge immediate pleasures to be representative of the greatest good, it is difficult to see how, exactly, we can circumvent this weakened state in order to suspend our more terrestrial desires and thus have the space to correctly judge which things will lead to our true happiness. While in the Essay Locke does not say as much as we might like on this topic, elsewhere in his writings we can get a sense for how he might respond to this question.

In 1684, Locke was asked by his friend Edward Clarke, for advice about raising and educating his children. In 1693, Locke’s musings on this topic were published as Some Thoughts Concerning Education (hereafter: Education). This text provides insight into the importance that Locke places on the connection between the pursuit of true happiness and early childhood education in general. Locke begins his discussion by noting that happiness is crucially dependent on the existence of both a sound mind and a sound body. He adds that it sometimes happens that by a great stroke of luck, someone is born whose constitution is so strong that they do not need help from others to direct their minds towards the things that will make them happy. But this is an extraordinarily rare occurrence. Indeed, Locke notes: “I think I may say, that, of all the men we meet with, nine parts of ten are what they are, good or evil, useful or not, by their education” (Education, §1). It is the education we receive as young children, on Locke’s view, that determines how adept we are at targeting the right objects in order to secure our happiness. He observes that the minds of young children are easily distracted by all kinds of sensory stimuli and notes that the first step to developing a mind that is focused on the right kind of things is to ensure that the body is healthy. Indeed, the objective in physical health is to get the body in the perfect state to be able to obey and carry out the mind’s commands. The more difficult part of this equation is training the mind to “be disposed to consent to nothing, but what may be suitable to the dignity and excellency of a rational creature” (Education, §31). And Locke goes further still, stating that the foundation of all virtue is to be placed in the ability of a human being to “deny himself his own desires, cross his own inclinations, and purely follow what reason directs as best, though the appetite lean the other way” (Education, §33). The way to do this, he says, is to resist immediately present pleasures and pains and to wait to act until reason has determined the value of the desirable things in one’s environment.

Locke states that we must recognize the difference between “natural wants” and “wants of fancy.” The former are the kinds of desires that must be obeyed and that no amount of reasoning will allow us to give up. The latter, however, are created. Locke states that parents and teachers must ensure that children develop the habit of resisting any kind of created fancy, thus keeping the mind free from desires for things that do not lead to true happiness (Education, §107). If parents and teachers are successful in blocking the development of “wants of fancy,” Locke thinks that the children who benefit from this success will become adults who will be “allowed greater liberty” because they will be more closely connected to the dictates of reason and not the dictates of passion (Education, §108). So, in order to live the moral life and listen to reason over passions, it seems that we need to have had the benefit of conscientious care-givers in our infancy and youth (see also Government, II.63). This raises the difficulty of how to connect an individual’s moral successes or failures with the individual herself. For, if she had the bad moral luck of unthinking or careless parents and teachers, it seems difficult to see how she could be blamed for failing to follow a virtuous path.

One way of approaching this difficulty is to recall that Locke takes the content of law of nature, the moral law decreed by God, to be the preservation both of ourselves and of the other people in our communities in order to glorify God (Law, IV). The dictate to help to preserve the other people in our community shifts some of the moral burden from the individual onto the community. This means that it is every individual’s responsibility to do all they can, all things considered, to preserve themselves and to ensure, to the best of their ability, that the children in their communities are raised to avoid developing wants of fancy. In this way, children will develop the habit of suspending their desires for terrestrial pleasures and focusing their efforts on attaining the true happiness that results from acting to secure remote goods.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Peter H. Nidditch. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
- This is the critical edition of Locke’s Essay. The body of the text is based on the fourth edition of the Essay and all the changes from the first edition through the fifth (1689, 1694, 1695, 1700, 1706) are indicated in the footnotes. The text also includes a comprehensive forward by Nidditch. Note that Locke’s orthography, grammar, and style are often quite different from the way that academic English is written today. In the citations from this text in particular, all emphases, capitalization, and odd spelling are original to Locke.
Essays on the Laws of Nature. Edited and translated by W. von Leyden. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1954.
- This edition includes both the original Latin and the English translation of the essays. It also includes Locke’s valedictory speech as censor of moral philosophy at Christ Church and some other shorter pieces of writing. Von Leyden’s introduction provides a very detailed discussion of the sources of Locke’s arguments in these essays, the arguments themselves, and the relations these arguments bear to other of Locke’s writings. It is worth noting here that on von Leyden’s interpretation, it is not possible to render Locke’s discussion of natural law consistent with his endorsement of a hedonistic motivational system in later works.
Political Essays. Edited by Mark Goldie. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
- This collection includes major writings on politics and government, including Essays on the Laws of Nature, Of Ethick in General, and An Essay on Toleration, in addition to many other minor essays.
The Correspondence of John Locke, in Eight Volumes. Edited by E.S. De Beer. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1976–89.
- A complete database of Locke’s correspondence including notes about his correspondents, notes about events and proper names mentioned in letters, as well as signposts for what was going on in Locke’s life at the time he was writing. The first volume of the collection includes an exhaustive introduction to Locke’s life, work, and contacts in the academic and social world; an explanation of how Locke’s letters were preserved; a discussion of previous publications of Locke’s correspondence and how they relate to this collection; and information about transcription practices, including details about editorial grammar decision and dating of the letters.
The Works of John Locke, in Nine Volumes, 12th edition. London: Rivington, 1824.
- This collection includes most of Locke’s longer texts, some shorter texts and a selection of letters. Among other things, the collection contains: Essay (vols.1 and 2), his correspondence with Stillingfleet (vol.3), Two Treatises of Government (vol.4), Letters on Toleration (vol.5), The Reasonableness of Christianity (vol.6), notes on St. Paul’s Epistles (vol.7), Some Thoughts Concerning Education and A Discourse of Miracles (vol.8), and a selection of letters (vol.9).

b. Secondary Sources: Books

Aaron, Richard I. John Locke. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1971.
- This is a comprehensive study of Locke’s life and works and includes fifteen very nice pages on Locke’s moral philosophy. Importantly, Aaron concludes that Locke fails to provide his readers with a science of morals and, in fact, that Locke’s disparate comments about ethics and moral principles cannot be reconciled.
Colman, John. John Locke’s Moral Philosophy. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1983.
- In this study, Colman addresses the major themes and problems of Locke’s moral theory including the connection between law and obligation, and the connection between moral principles and demonstrability.
Darwall, Stephen. The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’: 1640–1740. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- This is a deep and broad study of moral philosophy from the mid 17th to the mid 18th century. Locke is one among several central figures under discussion. The reader greatly benefits from Darwall’s careful discussions of the theoretical connections between Locke and his contemporaries and his influences on the topics of natural law, autonomy, motivation, duty, and freedom.
Lolordo, Antonia. Locke’s Moral Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2012.
- In this study, Lolordo draws on different parts of the Essay in order to see Locke’s theory of agency. She argues in favor of the interpretation according to which there are two senses of freedom in Locke’s view, one of which is properly used to attain the goal proper to a moral agent. Of particular interest is her discussion that links Locke’s comments about personal identity to moral agency and her claim that, for Locke, metaphysics is unnecessary for ethics.
Mabbot, J.D. John Locke. London: Macmillan Press, 1973.
- This is a study of Locke’s philosophical system that focuses on knowledge acquisition, logic and language, ethics and theology, and political theory. In his discussion of ethics and theology, Mabbot traces Locke’s discussions of moral principles, their demonstrability, and their binding force through The Two Treatises of Government, The Essays on the Laws of Nature, and An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Schouls, Peter A. Reasoned Freedom: John Locke and Enlightenment. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1992.
- This is a defense of the view that Locke was a great influence on enlightenment thought, in particular in the domains of reason and freedom. Schouls also points out what he takes to be many inconsistencies across and sometimes within Locke’s texts.
Yaffe, Gideon. Liberty Worth the Name: Locke on Free Agency. New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 2000.
- This is a book-length study of Locke’s view of human freedom. The content includes careful analysis of the chapter ‘Of Power’ of the Essay in addition to comments about how this chapter is connected to Locke’s discussion of personal identity. Yaffe defends an interpretation according to which Locke’s view contains two definitions of freedom, only one of which is “worth the name”—the kind of freedom that allows the pursuit of true good.

c. Secondary Sources: Articles

Chappell, Vere. “Locke on the Intellectual Basis of Sin.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 32 (1994): 197–207.
Chappell, Vere. “Locke on the Liberty of the Will.” In Locke’s Philosophy: Content and Context. Edited by G.A.J. Rogers, 101–21. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Chappell, Vere. “Power in Locke’s Essay.” In The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s “An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.” Edited by Lex Newman, 130–56. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- In these articles, Chappell advances the interpretation that changes made in the fifth edition of the Essay indicate that Locke changed his view about human freedom.
Darwall, Stephen. “The Foundations of Morality,” In The Cambridge Companion to Early Modern Philosophy. Edited by Donald Rutherford, 221–49.
- This paper canvasses the main themes explored by and influences on early modern moral theories, including Locke’s.
Glauser, Richard. “Thinking and Willing in Locke’s Theory of Human Freedom,” Dialogue 42 (2003): 695–724.
- Glauser argues that Locke’s view remains consistent across the changes made in the various editions of the Essay.
Magri, Tito. “Locke, Suspension of Desire, and the Remote Good,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 8 (2000): 55–70.
- Magri argues that Locke’s view changes over the course of the different editions of the Essay, in particular that he moves from having an “internalist” view of motivation to having an “externalist” view of motivation. Magri casts doubt on the consistency of Locke’s position.
Mathewson, Mark D. “John Locke and the Problems of Moral Knowledge,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 87 (2006): 509–26.
- Mathewson argues that Locke’s comments about the nature of moral ideas leads to moral subjectivity and relativism.
Rickless, Samuel. “Locke on Active Power, Freedom, and Moral Agency,” Locke Studies 13 (2013): 31–51.
Rickless, Samuel. “Locke on the Freedom to Will.” Locke Newsletter 31 (2000): 43–68.
- In these papers, Rickless argues that Locke holds one and only one definition of freedom: the ability to act according to our volitions. According to Rickless, Locke holds the same definition of freedom as Hobbes. The 2013 paper is a direct argument against the interpretation advanced by Lolordo in Locke’s Moral Man.
Schneewind, J.B. “Locke’s Moral Philosophy,” The Cambridge Companion to Locke. Edited by Vere Chappell. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994.
- Schneewind is one commentator who thinks that Locke’s moral philosophy ends up in a contradiction between the natural law view and hedonism.
Walsh, Julie. “Locke and the Power to Suspend Desire,” Locke Studies, 14 (2014).
- Walsh argues that Locke’s view remains consistent and coherent across the various editions of the Essay and emphasizes the role played by suspension and judgment in attaining true happiness.

Author Information

Julie Walsh
Email: julie.walsh@wellesley.edu
Wellesley College
U. S. A.

Truthmaker Theory

Truthmaker theory is the branch of metaphysics that explores the relationships between what is true and what exists. Discussions of truthmakers and truthmaking typically start with the idea that truth depends on being, and not vice versa. For example, if the sentence ‘Kangaroos live in Australia’ is true, then there are kangaroos living in Australia. And if there are kangaroos living in Australia, then the sentence ‘Kangaroos live in Australia’ is true. But we can ask whether the sentence is true because of the way the world is, or whether the world is the way it is because the sentence is true. Truthmaker theorists make the former claim that the sentence is true because of what exists in the world; it is not the case that the world is the way it is because of which sentences are true. Truthmaker theorists use this fundamental idea as a starting point for clarifying the nature of truth and its relationship to ontology, and to advance various views in metaphysics concerning the nature of the past and future, counterfactual conditionals, modality, and many others. Because truthmaker theorists end up with differing views concerning all these matters, what ultimately unites them is not any single thesis but rather a commitment to thinking that the idea of truthmaking is a useful one for pursuing metaphysical inquiry. Others might conceive of ‘truthmaker theory’ more strictly (such as by requiring a commitment to all truths having truthmakers, or all truthmakers being of a particular ontological variety), though defining the enterprise in this way will inevitably fail to capture all those earnestly pursuing investigation into truthmaking.

Philosophical discussion of truthmakers falls into two broad categories. First, there are ‘internal’ debates about the nature of truthmaker theory itself. For instance, there are open questions as to which truths have truthmakers: do all truths have truthmakers, or just some proper subset of truths (such as the positive truths or synthetic truths)? There are questions as to the nature of the truthmaking relation: is it a necessary relation or a contingent one? Is it a kind of supervenience, dependence, or something else? And it is an open question as to what sorts of objects serve as truthmakers: perhaps there are states of affairs, tropes, or counterparts that serve as truthmakers, or perhaps none of these. There is also frequent debate as to whether truthmaker theory constitutes a theory of truth (similar to, in particular, the correspondence theory of truth), or whether it is an entirely separate philosophical enterprise, one concerned more with metaphysics rather than semantics.

There are also ‘external’ truthmaking discussions that apply basic ideas about truthmaking to longstanding metaphysical topics. The hope is that truthmaker theory can bring new insights and argumentative resources to bear on traditional metaphysical inquiries. For example, truthmaker theorists investigate whether presentism—the view that only the present exists—can satisfy the obligations of truthmaker theory. Truthmaker theory has also been wielded against metaphysical views such as behaviorism and phenomenalism, and it has made contributions to the metaphysics of modality.

History of Truthmaker Theory
The Truthmaking Relation
Maximalism and Non-Maximalism
Kinds of Truthmakers
Truthmaking Principles
Truthmaking and Truth
Truthmaking and the Past
Truthmaking and Modality
Objections to Truthmaker Theory
References and Further Reading

1. History of Truthmaker Theory

Perhaps the first occurrence of a basic truthmaking idea is found in Aristotle’s Categories. There Aristotle points out that if a certain man exists, then a statement that that man exists is true, and vice versa. But it seems that there is a difference in priority between these two states of affairs. The statement is true because the man exists; it is not the case that the man exists because the statement is true. Aristotle is, in effect, raising a ‘Euthyphro’ question, drawing on Plato’s famous dialogue. Is the statement true because of the way the world is, or is the world the way it is because of which statements are true? Aristotle chose the former answer, and set the stage for discussions of truthmakers far down the road.

The idea of a truthmaker did not play a significant role in philosophy until the rise of logical atomism in the work of Bertrand Russell and Ludwig Wittgenstein. In the Philosophy of Logical Atomism, Russell takes it to be a truism that there are facts, and says that facts are the sort of thing that make propositions true or false. The project of logical atomism is then to determine what sorts of facts are ontologically required in order to make true all the different kinds of propositions. The most basic kind of fact for Russell is the atomic fact, which consists of no more than the possession of a quality by a particular object (or of the holding of a relation between multiple objects). Sentences like ‘X is green’ and ‘X is heavier than Y’, if true, are made true by atomic facts. More complex sentences like ‘X is green and is heavier than Y’ do not call for more complex, ‘molecular’ facts. Instead, the same atomic facts from before can explain the truth of conjunctive sentences. Particularly worrisome are negative truths, such as ‘X is not red’. Russell believed that there need to be negative facts to account for negative truths. In advocating for the existence of negative facts, Russell claims to have ‘nearly produced a riot’ when he suggested the idea at a seminar at Harvard (1985: 74). The idea that reality contains entities that are fundamentally negative in nature has long struck many philosophers as puzzling and metaphysically unacceptable, and there has been continuing controversy over what, if anything, makes negative truths true.

The next major advance in truthmaker theory came from the work of the Australian philosopher David Armstrong. Armstrong—who credits fellow philosopher Charlie Martin with inspiring him on the topic—has long advocated the use of truthmakers in metaphysics. Armstrong cites two paradigm examples of how truthmakers can be put to work in philosophy. First, there is the case of behaviorism, as defended by Gilbert Ryle (1949). Ryle’s philosophy of mind relies heavily on dispositions; Ryle thought that claims involving mental terms could be analyzed into subjunctive conditionals involving dispositions. What it is for Ryle to believe that he is a philosopher is that if he were to be asked what his profession was, he would reply ‘philosopher’. While this counterfactual may be true, the truthmaker theorist asks: but what is it that makes it true? The behaviorist faces a challenge of either accepting this counterfactual as a brute truth, a truth with no further explanation, or admitting that it is made true by some sort of mental state, thus abandoning the supposed ontological economy of behaviorism.

Similarly, Armstrong argues that the phenomenalism of philosophers such as Berkeley and Mill faces a parallel difficulty. According to phenomenalism, all that exists are sensory impressions. But might it not be true that there is a rock on the dark side of the moon that no one has ever observed? The phenomenalist accounts for this idea by claiming that if you were to go to that part of the moon, you would have a rock-like sensory impression. But again: what makes that counterfactual true? The anti-phenomenalist will say that the counterfactual is true because it is made true (at least in part) by the rock itself. The phenomenalist, limited by an ontology of actual sense impressions, is hard-pressed to find a plausible answer to the truthmaker theorist’s question.

In the wake of Armstrong’s (and others’) writings, truthmaker theory became a lively corner of contemporary metaphysics.

2. The Truthmaking Relation

A key concern of truthmaker theory is giving an account of the truthmaking relation. When some object X is a truthmaker for some truth Y, what is the nature of the relationship that X and Y stand in?

One universally agreed upon fact about the truthmaking relation is that it is not a one-one relation. That is, in principle an object can be a truthmaker for multiple truths, and any given truth can have multiple truthmakers. For example, Socrates is frequently thought to be a truthmaker not only for ‘Socrates exists’, but also for ‘Socrates is human’ and ‘There are humans’. For it is impossible that Socrates—who is essentially human—could exist and yet any of those sentences be false (at least given some familiar assumptions about essences). Similarly, ‘There are humans’ is made true by many things—anything that is essentially human, in fact. Hence, it can be misleading to ask what the truthmaker for some truth is, since it is not necessary that truths have only one, unique truthmaker.

So what exactly is the nature of the relation? To ask this question is to probe what sort of analysis, if any, can be given of the truthmaking relation. Many truthmaker theorists have argued that the truthmaking relation, at the least, requires metaphysical necessitation. Some object X necessitates the truth of Y if and only if it is metaphysically impossible for X to exist, and yet Y not be true. In the language of possible worlds, X necessitates Y if and only if every possible world in which X exists is a world in which Y is true. Necessitation is thought to be a necessary component of the truthmaking relation because it shows that the truthmaker’s existence is a sufficient condition on the truth in question. If X’s existence were not enough to guarantee Y’s truth, then X would not yet adequately explain or account for the truth of Y. Something else, in addition to X, would be needed to properly account for Y’s truth.

Not all theorists have agreed that necessitation is necessary for truthmaking. Hugh Mellor (2003), for instance, at one point argued that truthmakers need not necessitate the truths that they make true. Mellor relied on the controversial case of general truths, such as ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’. Suppose there are three such spheres, A, B, and C. Then there are three states of affairs (Mellor calls them ‘facta’): A’s being less than a mile in diameter, B’s being less than a mile in diameter, and C’s being less than a mile in diameter. For Mellor, the truthmaker for the general truth is no more than the sum of the three states of affairs. But these three states of affairs do not necessitate the truth of ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’, since it is possible that that very sum could exist, and yet the sentence be false. That is a case where, for example, A, B, and C all exist with diameters less than a mile, but a fourth gold sphere D exists whose diameter is greater than a mile. Mellor reasons that the sum of the three states of affairs is the truthmaker for ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’, and thus concludes that truthmaking does not require necessitation. (Furthermore, on his view, the truthmaking relation is contingent in the sense that whether X is a truthmaker for Y can vary from world to world. Those who accept necessitation would reject this consequence.) Other theorists argue that truthmaking does require necessitation, and so the sum is not a truthmaker for the sentence; something else (such as one of the totality states of affairs discussed below) is needed to provide a truthmaker, or perhaps it has no truthmaker at all (according to advocates of the supervenience accounts discussed below).

It is more common for philosophers to challenge the sufficiency of the necessitation condition, rather than its necessity. The concern that necessitation is not enough derives in large part from the fact that all objects necessitate the truth of all necessary truths. This is the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths. For example, Socrates necessitates ‘2 + 2 = 4’, for it is metaphysically impossible for Socrates to exist and yet ‘2 + 2 = 4’ be false. Similarly, if God exists, and exists necessarily, then a torn, dog-eared copy of Lolita rotting away in some landfill necessitates the truth of ‘God exists’. If it is impossible for that sentence to be false, then it is impossible for that sentence to be false should that rotting copy of Lolita exist. But—according to this line of thought—Socrates is not a truthmaker for ‘2 + 2 = 4’, and the copy of Lolita is not a truthmaker for ‘God exists’. Truthmaking requires more than just necessitation.

Theories divide as to what exactly else is required of the truthmaking relation. Trenton Merricks (2007) has argued that truthmaking requires ‘aboutness’, in that X is a truthmaker for Y only if Y is about X. Mathematical claims are not about Socrates, and so Socrates cannot make them true. ‘God exists’ is about God, so only God is a candidate truthmaker for it. Those who accept Merricks’s proposal thereby avoid the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths.

E. J. Lowe (2007) conceives of truthmaking as depending upon the essences of propositions. X is a truthmaker for Y only if it is part of the essence of Y that it be true should an object like X exist. This amendment solves the problem of trivial truthmakers because it is no part of the essence of the proposition expressed by ‘God exists’ that it be true should the copy of Lolita exist. The essence of the proposition that God exists has nothing to do with the rotting copy of Lolita, just as the proposition that two and two are four has nothing to do with Socrates. Lowe criticizes his own view on the grounds that it implies that propositions can be related to things that do not exist. For example, Batman could have been a truthmaker for ‘There are humans’, since the nature of the proposition that there are humans is such that it is true if things like Batman existed. So according to Lowe’s account, the proposition’s essence appears to stand in a relation to a non-existent entity, which is concerning for anyone who takes relations to entail the existence of their relata.

Regardless of how the problem of trivial truthmakers is solved, theorists seem to be agreed that the truthmaking relation, however ultimately analyzed, needs to be treated as a hyperintensional relation. That is, as a matter of necessity, a particular object could exist and a particular claim could be true in all the same possible worlds without that object being a truthmaker for the claim. Hence, truthmaking is a relation that is more discriminating than modal relations such as necessitation. Truthmaking is thus more like a dependence relation, or a grounding relation, than relations like necessitation or supervenience. Sometimes it is said that truthmaking is an ‘in virtue of’ relation: X is a truthmaker for Y because Y is true ‘in virtue’ of the existence of X (for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006c). X is somehow ontologically responsible for the truth of Y, and no merely intensional relation is thought to capture this deeper connection between a truth and its truthmaker.

Some theorists accept that truthmaking is a kind of ‘in virtue of’ relation, but deny that it can be further analyzed. This is the view of, for example, Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra (2006c), who holds that the truthmaking relation is a primitive notion that resists analysis.

In addition to the project of analyzing the components of the truthmaking relation (or admitting that such an analysis cannot be offered), there is also a question of what the structural and logical features of the relation are. One issue concerns the nature of the kinds of relata that the relation takes. The relation is typically understood to hold between a truth and a truthmaker. In this sense it is usually ‘cross-categorial’ in that it obtains between very different kinds of things, items from different categories. The truth that Socrates exists is made true by Socrates: here we have a case where the truthmaking relation obtains between a person and a truthbearer.

For many truthmaker theorists, there is no restriction on the kind of object that can be a truthmaker. To be a truthmaker, something just needs to appropriately account for the truth of some truthbearer. On this view, truthmakers are just whatever sorts of things are ontologically available. Other views impose restrictions. For example, one might argue that only facts or state of affairs are properly thought of as truthmakers. On this view, Socrates could not be a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’ because Socrates himself is not a fact or state of affairs. (At best he is a sort of abstraction from various states of affairs or facts.) There must be some other entity, such as the fact that Socrates exists, or a state of affairs composed by Socrates and an existence property, that makes the sentence true. Other views would find this perspective ontologically inflating: we do not need, in addition to Socrates, some further state of affairs that requires a property of existence in order to give an ontological account of the truth of ‘Socrates exists’. Finally, some have thought that only certain entities deserve to be thought of as truthmakers, such as fundamental entities (for example, Cameron 2008). On this view, X is a truthmaker for Y only if X is a fundamental entity.

As for the other side of the truthmaking relation, theorists disagree as to what sorts of objects are the bearers of truth. More restrictive views maintain that there is only one sort of truthbearer, or that there is only one primary kind of truthbearer, compared to which all other truthbearers are derivative. For example, a common view is that some sentence or belief bears truth only in virtue of expressing a true proposition, where propositions are the primary bearers of truth and falsity. More liberal views are happy to concede that there are a variety of truthbearers, and that they can all stand in the truthmaking relation. It is not clear that substantive questions about truthmaker theory turn on one’s background views about truthbearers, but it is wise to be sensitive to the ways in which truthmaking considerations might be affected by issues concerning truthbearers. For example, one could argue that while Socrates is a sufficient truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates exists (for it is impossible for Socrates to exist and yet that proposition be false), he is not a sufficient truthmaker for the sentence ‘Socrates exists’ because it is possible for Socrates to exist and yet the sentence be false, should the sentence have turned out to have a different meaning. For example, it is possible that ‘Socrates exists’ could have meant something else—such as that Socrates is Persian—and so it is possible that Socrates could have existed and that sentence be false. On this reading, then, one might take the truthmaker for the (uninterpreted) sentence to be more involved than the truthmaker for the proposition that sentence contingently expresses. What makes ‘Socrates exists’ true is Socrates plus whatever it is that makes it true that ‘Socrates exists’ means that Socrates exists.

Finally, consider some of the logical features of the truthmaking relation. In particular, there is the issue of how truthmaking stands with respect to reflexivity, symmetry, and transitivity. A relation is reflexive when every object that stands in the relation stands in the relation to itself. This would mean that every truth is its own truthmaker. The cross-categorial nature of truthmaking prohibits this possibility. Because not all truthmakers are truthbearers, the truthmaking relation is not reflexive.

Many theorists argue that truthmaking is irreflexive, in that there is no instance of something standing in the truthmaking relation to itself. (Hence, irreflexivity is stronger than the view that truthmaking is non-reflexive, which means that not every truth is its own truthmaker.) The general thought here is that truthmaking is a kind of dependence relation, and nothing can depend upon itself. But there are plausible counterexamples to irreflexivity. For example, the proposition that there are propositions appears to be a case of self-truthmaking. Because that proposition exists, it is true. One might respond by saying that the relation in this case actually holds between the existence of the proposition and the truth of the proposition, and so not between one and the same thing. This response, however, requires a substantial rethinking of the nature of the truthmaking relation (such that it no longer holds between truthmakers and truthbearers), and the apparent reification of properties like truth and existence.

Similar remarks apply to symmetry. A symmetric relation is one where if X bears it to Y, Y bears it to X. The cross-categorial nature of truthmaking again shows that the truthmaking relation is not in general symmetric. Not all truthmakers are truthbearers. But because some truthbearers can be truthmakers, the possibility for symmetry arises, in which case the relation is just non-symmetric. (Again, some will resist by suggesting that truthmaking, as a kind of dependence, must be anti-symmetric: if X depends on Y, Y does not depend on X.) In fact, any case of reflexive truthmaking will provide a case of symmetric truthmaking.

Finally consider transitivity: if X stands in R to Y, and Y stands in R to Z, then X stands in R to Z. Transitivity fails for obvious reasons. Socrates is a truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates exists, and the proposition that Socrates exists is a truthmaker for the proposition that there are propositions. But Socrates is no truthmaker for the proposition that there are propositions. Truthmaking is not transitive in general, but there could be individual instances of it (drawing on the same cases of reflexivity and symmetry).

3. Maximalism and Non-Maximalism

Another central question any truthmaker theorist must address concerns which truths have truthmakers. Perhaps all truths have truthmakers, or perhaps just some proper subset of the truths have truthmakers. Truthmaker maximalism is the thesis that all truths have truthmakers. Truthmaker non-maximalism maintains that there are truthmaker gaps: truths that have no truthmaker.

There have not been many arguments for maximalism. Its defenders frequently claim that the view is on its own quite intuitive and plausible. Resisting maximalism, according to such advocates, threatens to court the view that truths can ‘float free’ of reality. A truth without a truthmaker, on this view, is a brute truth, a truth for which there can be no explanation. Such truths, if they exist, are thought by maximalists to be metaphysically mysterious. Others have argued for maximalism by conceiving of having a truthmaker as being somehow essential to being true. If what it is to be true is to have a truthmaker, then something cannot be true without having a truthmaker. (The relationship between truth and truthmaking is further discussed in section 5.)

One motivation for non-maximalism is the existence of plausible counterexamples to the thesis that all truths have truthmakers. Consider negative existential truths, such as ‘There are no merlions’. On the face of it, the sentence is true not because some kind of thing exists; it is true because nothing of a different kind exists. A truthmaker for the negative existential would have to be some sort of entity whose existence excluded the existence of merlions, and explained their non-existence. But there is nothing in the world among the ‘positive’ entities that can guarantee that there are no merlions. Take, for example, the set of all the actually existing animals. Taken together, their existence does not guarantee the absence of merlions. For that set of animals could exist and yet it still be true that there are, in addition, merlions. It is only if we somehow combine the existence of those animals together with the fact that those animals are all the animals that we can find a suitable truthmaker for the negative existential.

Armstrong introduced a ‘totaling’ relation in response to these difficulties. For example, there is a state of affairs composed of the sum of all the animals standing in the totaling relation to the property of being an animal. This state of affairs fixes which animals exist, and so excludes the existence of any merlions. Armstrong generalizes this approach when he argues for the existence of what he calls the ‘totality state of affairs’. This is a second-order state of affairs that is composed of the sum of all the first-order state of affairs standing in the totaling relation to the property of being a first-order state of affairs. The existence of this second-order state of affairs thereby guarantees that the first-order states of affairs that partially compose it are all the first-order states of affairs there are. This single totality state of affairs can be a truthmaker for all negative existentials (and every other truth besides).

Like Russell’s negative facts, totality states of affairs are thought by many to be entities that are not fully ‘positive’. Their existence seems to concern what is not in addition to what is, and this is thought to be metaphysically suspicious. One way of putting the worry is that they are entities whose existence bears on the existence of things that are fully distinct from them. Ordinarily, one object’s existence does not bear on the existence of other objects that are separate from it. The existence of the Statue of Liberty neither entails nor excludes the existence of the Eiffel Tower. Neither does their existence exclude the existence of other potential landmarks that happen not to exist (such as a replica of the Statue of Liberty in Victoria Harbour). Totality states of affairs are different. The totality of animals excludes the existence of merlions, though merlions are entirely distinct from totalities of animals. For this reason, some philosophers have sought to develop non-maximalist approaches to truthmaker theory.

One prominent way of defending non-maximalism is to defend alternate principles that attempt to capture the dependence of truth upon being, but without admitting that all truths have truthmakers. One such principle is the thesis that truth supervenes on being, and it has been defended in both strong and weak versions. The strong version, defended by John Bigelow (1988), is the principle that if some proposition P is true at some world W₁ but not world W₂, then there must exist some entity at W₁ that does not exist at W₂, or some entity that exists at W₂ but not W₁. This principle captures the idea that what is true cannot vary from possible world to possible world unless there is some corresponding difference in the ontology of those worlds. Truth thus depends on being, although some truths escape having truthmakers. To see why, suppose that ‘There are merlions’ is false at W₁ but true at W₂. The principle implies that something must exist in one of these worlds but not the other. In this case, there is a merlion that exists at W₂ but does not exist at W₁. Although the negative existential ‘There are no merlions’ is true at W₁, it has no truthmaker in that world. Nevertheless, its truth depends on the ontology of the world in the sense that, had it been false, there would have been something in the world’s ontology (namely, a merlion) that it does not currently have.

David Lewis (2001) has defended a weaker supervenience principle. For Lewis, if some proposition P is true at some world W₁ but not world W₂, then either there must exist some entity at only one of the worlds, or some group of things must stand in some fundamental relation at one of the worlds but not the other. Like the strong supervenience principle, this weaker principle allows one to accept negative existentials as truthmaker gaps, but also allows one to treat contingent predications as truthmaker gaps. For example, suppose that while W₁ and W₂ contain all the same objects, they differ with respect to the properties those objects have. For example, suppose some object O is blue in W₁, but red in W₂. Because ‘O is blue’ is true in W₁ but false in W₂, the strong supervenience principle requires that there be some entity that exists in one of the worlds but not the other. But ex hypothesi the two worlds have the same ontology. The advocate of strong supervenience (alongside the maximalist) requires something like a blueness trope or state of affairs (that is, O’s being blue) to exist in W₁ but not W₂. The contingent predication still needs a truthmaker. The advocate of weak supervenience, by contrast, does not require the contingent predication to have a truthmaker. While there is no entity that guarantees the truth of ‘O is blue’ in W₁, its truth nevertheless depends on being in the sense that had it been false, there must be some difference in what exists, or in what properties those things have and what relations they stand in. The worlds where ‘O is blue’ is false are worlds where either O does not exist, or has different properties, such as being red.

Maximalism, strong supervenience, and weak supervenience are all attempts to capture the basic intuition behind truthmaker theory, and avoid the commitment to there being truths that ‘float free’ of reality. Some philosophers, however, have admitted that there are truths that do not depend on being at all, in any sense. Roy Sorensen (2001), for example, has argued that the puzzling truthteller sentence ‘This very sentence is true’ has a determinate truth value, but that it can never be known. Unlike the paradoxical liar sentence (‘This very sentence is false’), the truthteller is consistent: it can be true or false without contradiction. Sorensen argues that the truthteller is what we might call a deep truthmaker gap. Its truth does not depend on being in any sense, whereas shallow truthmaker gaps like contingent predications and negative existentials (if indeed they are truthmaker gaps) still in some sense depend on being. Sorensen argues that the truthteller’s status as a deep truthmaker gap explains why its truth value is unknowable: because we usually come to know truths by way of some kind of connection to their truthmakers, the fact that the truthteller (or its negation) lacks a truthmaker explains why we do not know its truth value.

Other forms of non-maximalism include the thesis that only ‘positive’ truths have truthmakers (however the positive/negative distinction may be articulated), that only synthetic truths have truthmakers, and that only contingent truths have truthmakers. It is incumbent upon theorists adopting such views that they explain why negative, analytic, or necessary truths are best thought of as not requiring truthmakers when accounting for their truth.

Finally, consider the following argument against maximalism, which does not turn at all on the plausibility of the various sorts of ontological truthmaking posits. Consider the sentence ‘This very sentence has no truthmaker’. This sentence is provably true (see Milne 2005). To see why, first suppose it is false. In that case, it has a truthmaker, in which case it is true: contradiction. So it must be true after all. Therefore, it has no truthmaker, since that is what it says about itself. It is a truthmaker gap. Here, simple reasoning leads to the view that there is at least one truth without a truthmaker. Many maximalists reject this argument (sometimes by assimilating it to the liar paradox), but nevertheless it remains to be seen where the reasoning goes wrong (see, for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006a).

4. Kinds of Truthmakers

Truthmaker theorists are motivated by ontological questions: we can make progress on figuring out what exists by pursuing questions about what truthmakers there are. Considerations about truthmaking have thus led to different views about what exactly is included in the world’s ontology. These considerations often go hand in hand with the ancient metaphysical debate between realists and nominalists in discussions over the nature and existence of universals.

In his logical atomism, Russell just accepted as a truism the existence of facts, which are the sorts of things that make propositions true. Armstrong accepts the existence of similar objects, but he calls them ‘states of affairs’. A state of affairs is a complex object composed (in a non-mereological way) by a particular together with a universal. To offer a simplified example, suppose there is a universal of being a philosopher. Socrates instantiates this universal, and so in addition to the existence of Socrates and the universal, there is a third thing—we might call it ‘Socrates’s being a philosopher’—that is a kind of fusion of the other two.

Armstrong offers a truthmaking argument for the existence of states of affairs. It is true that Socrates is a philosopher. But Socrates does not make this claim true. Because the claim is a contingent predication, it is possible that Socrates could have existed and yet not been a philosopher. So Socrates does not necessitate the truth of ‘Socrates is a philosopher’, and so is not a truthmaker for the sentence. Nor does the universal being a philosopher necessitate ‘Socrates is a philosopher’, for it might have existed without Socrates being a philosopher. (Something else could have instantiated the universal.) Furthermore, not even the mereological sum of Socrates together with being a philosopher necessitates ‘Socrates is a philosopher’. For a world in which Socrates exists but is not a philosopher, though someone else is, is a world where the mereological sum exists but the sentence is false. On this basis, Armstrong argues that there must be something else, a state of affairs, that is a fusion of the particular and the property. Every world where the state of affairs composed by Socrates and being a philosopher is a world where ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is true. On this basis, Armstrong defends the existence of states of affairs in the name of offering a satisfying truthmaker theory for contingent predications.

Similarly, Armstrong argues that we also need totality states of affairs in order to find truthmakers for negative and general truths. All the first-order states of affairs that exist are not enough to guarantee that there are no unicorns, or that all spheres of gold are less than a mile in diameter. So Armstrong posits the existence of a totaling relation, and second-order states of affairs partially composed by it. Again we see truthmaking considerations driving an ontological argument for the existence of entities that we might not ordinarily posit.

Not all truthmaker theorists accept Armstrong’s pro-universals and pro-states of affairs approach to truthmaker theory. Others have defended nominalist positions that reject the existence of universals, and so maintain the thesis that reality is exhausted by the particular. One popular ‘moderate’ form of nominalism is the view that there are tropes, which are individual, particularized property instances. Whereas the realist maintains that there is one unified thing, the universal of being a philosopher that is commonly instantiated by both Plato and Aristotle, the trope nominalist argues that there are two different ‘being a philosopher’ tropes: the trope associated with Plato is a distinct existence from the trope associated with Aristotle. Tropes, at least if thought of as essentially tied to their bearers, can serve as truthmakers for contingent predications. If Socrates’s being a philosopher trope exists, it must be true that Socrates is a philosopher. That trope, whose identity is bound up with Socrates, cannot in any sense be ‘transferred’ to Aristotle or anyone else. So tropes are sufficient necessitators for contingent predications. For those who find tropes ontologically advantageous over universals and states of affairs, this is a compelling argument. (It remains to be seen, however, whether trope theorists can provide truthmakers for negative and general truths, and so whether they must also, in the end, posit the existence of states of affairs.)

Another nominalist-friendly approach to truthmakers comes from David Lewis (2003), who uses counterpart theory to resist the above arguments for states of affairs and tropes. On Lewis’s view, an object exists in only one possible world, but has counterparts in different possible worlds. But there are multiple ways of thinking about objects, and so multiple ways of identifying an object’s counterparts. For example, we can use the name ‘Socrates qua philosopher’ to identify a series of counterparts to Socrates, all of whom are philosophers. Similarly, ‘Socrates qua Greek’ identifies Socrates in a way such that all his counterparts are Greek. Lewis next maintains that objects under counterpart relations can be truthmakers for contingent predications: every possible world in which Socrates qua philosopher exists is a world in which Socrates (or his counterpart) is a philosopher. So Lewis provides necessitating truthmakers for contingent predications without admitting the existence of tropes or states of affairs.

The previous arguments presuppose that contingent predications and/or negative and general truths require truthmakers. If they do, then truthmaker theorists are led to positing the existence of objects such as universals, tropes, states of affairs, and counterparts. A competing perspective, however, derives from a refusal to assume maximalist truthmaking principles, and so avoids such arguments. This alternative approach does not assume from the beginning that contingent predications and/or negative and general truths require truthmakers, and so is not ready to concede that we need an ontology of counterparts, tropes, or states of affairs. Instead of defending the existence of such entities, these truthmaker theorists defend the truth of non-maximalist truthmaker principles (as discussed in section 3). For example, advocates of the strong supervenience principle—that any difference in truth between two possible worlds requires a difference in ontology between the two worlds—believe that negative and general truths do not require truthmakers, and so, for example, Armstrong’s argument for totality states of affairs is unsuccessful. Similarly, advocates of the weak supervenience principle—that any difference in truths between two possible worlds requires either a difference in ontology or a difference in what fundamental relations objects stand in—argue that contingent predications do not require truthmakers, and so the arguments above do not succeed in showing that such posits exist.

5. Truthmaking Principles

Some very general and controversial principles concerning truthmaker theory have been canvassed above, such as maximalism, strong and weak supervenience, and principles concerning whether the truthmaking relation is irreflexive (or merely non-reflexive), asymmetric (or merely non-symmetric), or anti-transitive (or merely non-transitive). Other disputed truthmaking principles concern how truthmakers relate to one another, and what other logical principles apply in the theory of truthmaking.

One such principle in truthmaker theory is the entailment principle: if X is a truthmaker for Y, then X is a truthmaker for anything entailed by Y. For example, suppose that the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher exists, and is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates is a philosopher’. Because ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ entails ‘Something is a philosopher’, the entailment principle holds that the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher is also a truthmaker for ‘Something is a philosopher’. Furthermore, any other state of affairs involving the universal being a philosopher will also be a truthmaker for ‘Something is a philosopher’, since the truthmaking relation is not one-one.

While seemingly quite plausible, the entailment principle runs into an immediate difficulty: the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths. ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ also entails ‘2 + 2 =4’, at least when entailment is thought of on the model of necessary truth preservation. Every world where ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is true is a world where ‘2 + 2 = 4’ is true. But, presumably, the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher is not a truthmaker for ‘2 + 2 =4’, though the entailment principle suggests otherwise. In response, truthmaker theorists find ways to restrict the entailment principle, or offer alternate understandings of the kind of entailment in question. Generally speaking, truthmaker theorists attempt to articulate a hyperintensional account of entailment that is more modally discriminating than standard entailment. For example, one might think that some sort of relevance notion of entailment is at stake (for example, Restall 1996); the hope is to develop a conception of entailment that maintains that while ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ entails ‘Someone is a philosopher’, it does not entail ‘2 + 2 =4’.

Another plausible truthmaking principle—and one entailed by the entailment principle—is the conjunction principle. According to this principle, any truthmaker for a conjunction is also a truthmaker for the individual conjuncts. The conjunction principle follows from the entailment principle simply because conjuncts are entailed by the conjunctions they compose. While plausible, the principle has been doubted (for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006c). The principle might seem appealing so long as we think of the truthmaking relation as tracking entailment relations. But recall that the truthmaking relation is not just a necessitation or entailment relation. As an ‘in virtue of’ relation, there is more to being a truthmaker than just being a necessitator. Take, for example, the conjunctive truth ‘Socrates exists and Aristotle exists’. A plausible truthmaker for this conjunction is the mereological sum composed by Socrates and Aristotle. If that sum exists, the conjunction has to be true. But is that mereological sum a truthmaker for the individual conjuncts? Put another way: is ‘Socrates exists’ true in virtue of the existence of the mereological sum Socrates + Aristotle? One might say: no, ‘Socrates exists’ is true in virtue of the existence of Socrates, period. The mereological sum, while a genuine necessitator of the truth of ‘Socrates exists’, is not the entity responsible for the sentence’s truth. The truthmaker for the conjunction, in effect, has ‘extraneous’ parts that are irrelevant to the truth of some of its conjuncts. Since truthmaking is thought of as a hyperintensional relation such that mere necessitation is not sufficient for truthmaking, there is room to doubt that Socrates + Aristotle is a genuine truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’. Other philosophers who defend the conjunction principle may simply accept the sum as an adequate, albeit non-‘minimal’ truthmaker for the conjunct. (That is, the truthmaker has a proper part that is also a truthmaker.) After all, a truth may have multiple truthmakers on the standard view.

A similar candidate truthmaking principle is the disjunction principle: any truthmaker for a disjunction is a truthmaker for at least one of the disjuncts. For example, if Socrates is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists or Cthulhu exists’, then he is a truthmaker either for ‘Socrates exists’ or ‘Cthulhu exists’. The principle seems innocuous enough, until one considers necessary disjunctions of the form ‘p or it is not the case that p’. If one accepts the basic entailment principle, then any object whatsoever is a truthmaker for every claim of the form ‘p or it is not the case that p’. By the disjunction principle, any object whatsoever is therefore a truthmaker of either ‘p’ or ‘it is not the case that p’, depending upon which one is the true disjunct. As a result, every object is a truthmaker for every truth. This unfortunate result has led many to rethink the plausibility of the entailment and disjunction principles. (This problem may well be circumvented if a ‘relevance’ style amendment to the entailment principle is offered.)

A similar, but less controversial truthmaking principle about disjunction would be that any object that is a truthmaker for some truth is also a truthmaker for any disjunction that includes that truth as a disjunct. So since Socrates is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’, he is also a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists or Caesar sank in the Rubicon’. This sort of principle has been at work since the beginning of truthmaker theory; Russell (1985) relied on it when arguing that we need not posit a realm of disjunctive facts to make disjunctive propositions true. Atomic facts on their own suffice to serve as truthmakers for disjunctions.

6. Truthmaking and Truth

This section is a halfway house in the transition away from the internal concerns of truthmaker theory, and toward its external connections with other domains of philosophy, for it is controversial whether or not the theory of truth is a distinct domain from the theory of truthmakers. This section explores the relationship between the theory of truth and the theory of truthmakers, and surveys the possible attitudes one might take about their relationship to one another.

The history of truthmaker theory is inextricably linked with the correspondence theory. The metaphysical ambitions of Russell’s logical atomism are a natural extension of the correspondence theory of truth that he was beginning to accept around the same time period. Nowadays truthmaker theory is sometimes thought of as a modified, contemporary update of correspondence theory. It is no great mystery why. According to correspondence theories of truth, a proposition is true if and only if it stands in the correspondence relation to some worldly entity. (Oftentimes these entities are thought to be facts.) According to truthmaker theory, it seems that propositions are true if and only if they have a truthmaker; that is, a proposition is true just in case it stands in the truthmaking relation to some worldly entity, its truthmaker. If one identifies the truthmaking relation with the correspondence relation, and the set of truthmakers (facts or not) with the set of corresponding objects, then it certainly appears that truthmaker theory provides a correspondence-style theory of truth.

Notice that the above perspective presupposes maximalism. The only possible way of finding a theory of truth (let alone a correspondence theory of truth) inside truthmaker theory is to first commit to the thesis that every truth has a truthmaker. Any truthmaker gap would be an exception to anyone trying to explain the nature of truth by way of truthmakers. So the fact that maximalism is an optional requirement of truthmaker theory shows that taking truthmaker theory to be a theory of truth is also optional at best.

Even granting maximalism, anyone who seeks to define truth in terms of truthmakers still faces a crucial challenge. The truthmaking relation is itself typically understood in terms of truth. Truthmakers are objects that necessitate the truth of certain propositions, and not their other features. The accounts of the truthmaking relation canvassed in section 2 all presuppose the notion of truth. The essential dependence account, for example, holds that X is a truthmaker for Y only if Y is essentially such that it is true if X exists. Unless truthmaking can somehow be analyzed without further resort to truth, it cannot, on pain of circularity, be put to work in defining truth. Truth, it seems, is prior to truthmaking. Truthmaker theory presupposes the notion of truth, and so is not fit to serve as a theory of truth itself.

If truthmaker theory presupposes the notion of truth, does it presuppose any particular conception of truth? Again, many might think that truthmaker theory presupposes a correspondence theory of truth, or some similar substantive theory of truth. Several philosophers have also argued that truthmaker theory is incompatible with deflationary theories of truth (for example, Vision 2005). According to deflationary theories, truth is not a substantive property of propositions, in virtue of which they are true. The proposition that snow is white is not true in virtue of its having some property, or standing in a particular relation (for example, correspondence) to some object (or fact). Rather, the deflationist maintains, there is nothing more to the truth of the proposition that snow is white other than snow being white.

Accordingly, some might see deflationary theories of truth as containing an implicit rejection of truthmaker theory. As a result, truthmaker theory is incompatible with deflationary theories, and must presuppose some substantive theory of truth. (If not correspondence, there are coherence theories, pragmatic theories, epistemic theories, and others.) But it is not at all clear that anything in truthmaker theory conflicts with deflationary theories of truth. The latter tend to consist of axioms such as ‘The proposition that snow is white is true if and only if snow is white’ and ‘The proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true if and only if Socrates is a philosopher’. These biconditionals themselves do not conflict with anything in truthmaker theory (or, typically, with any other theory of truth, either). Deflationists also maintain, in addition, that these axioms exhaust all there is to be said about the nature of truth. (It is this negative claim that substantive theories of truth must reject.) But truthmaker theorists need not be offering the claims of their theories as in any way revealing the nature of truth itself. To say that the truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is a particular trope, state of affairs, or Socrates under a counterpart relation is not to say anything about the nature of truth itself. Rather, it is a claim about the particular ontological grounds needed for a particular claim about Socrates. In principle, truthmaker theorists and deflationists have nothing that they must disagree about.

7. Truthmaking and the Past

A longstanding metaphysical question concerns the reality of the past. Everyone can agree that entities in the present exist. But what about the objects that do not currently exist but someday will? And what about objects that used to exist but exist no longer? Presentism is the view that reality is exhausted by the present; the only things that exist are entities in the present. Eternalism, by contrast, is the view that there is no time limit on what exists: entities from the past are just as real as presently existing entities, which are just as real as future entities.

The existence of non-present entities is a highly contentious issue in philosophy. What is less controversial is the fact that there are, presently, truths about entities from the past. Presentists and eternalists disagree as to whether Socrates, a past entity, exists. But they agree that ‘Socrates existed’ is true. (What is more contentious is whether or not there are, right now, truths about the future. Parallel problems arise for those who think that there are truths about the future, but do not believe in the existence of purely future entities.) Eternalists face no difficulty in accounting for how such claims can be true. Socrates is the truthmaker for ‘Socrates existed’ in just the way that the Eiffel Tower is the truthmaker for ‘The Eiffel Tower exists’. Socrates and the Eiffel Tower are equally real, from the eternalist’s metaphysical point of view. One is located entirely in the past, and the other is located (but not entirely) in the present. But the present is not metaphysically privileged, so entities from the past and future are freely available to eternalists to serve as truthmakers.

Presentism, by contrast, faces a challenge from truthmaker theory. Given that there are truths about the past, but nothing (fully) from the past that exists, presentists are at pains when accounting for what, if anything, there is that can make those truths about the past true. Presentists have two available options: First, they can deny that truths about the past have truthmakers. Second, they can attempt to show that there are sufficient ontological resources in the present to ground the truths about the past.

Consider first the strategy of denying that truths about the past have truthmakers. This is a form of non-maximalism that limits truthmakers to truths about the present. Recall from section 3 that there are two distinct ways of conceiving of truthmaker gaps, that is, truths without truthmakers. There are deep truthmaker gaps, which are truths that do not depend in any way whatsoever upon what exists. Deep truthmaker gaps violate the principle that truth supervenes upon being: a deep truthmaker gap could be true in one world, but false in another, without there being any other difference between the two worlds. Shallow truthmaker gaps, by contrast, do not have truthmakers, but their truth is nonetheless ontologically accountable (by way, perhaps, of their adherence to one of the supervenience principles).

It appears that presentists cannot take advantage of the supervenience principles that have been defended by truthmaker theorists, and so appear to be forced into the view that if truths about the past are truthmaker gaps, they are deep truthmaker gaps. To see why, consider two presentist universes. These worlds are metaphysically indiscernible at the present moment: all the same things exist, and stand in the same fundamental relations. But they have different histories. In one of the universes, at some point some radioactive atom A decayed within its half-life, while a neighboring atom B did not. In the other universe, B decayed within its half-life, that is, within the predicted time it would take for half of a group of B-like atoms to radioactively decay, while A did not. So in the first universe, ‘A decayed within its half-life’ is true, while it is false in the second universe. But this difference has made no later difference in the histories of these universes, and so now, at present, the two universes are indiscernible. Yet something is true in one of them but not the other. So supervenience has been violated: they are discernible with respect to truth, but indiscernible with respect to being. Hence, presentists cannot defend a non-maximalist perspective on truths about the past without conceding that those truths are deep truthmaker gaps. But deep truthmaker gaps are highly unattractive—they make the truths in question brute, inexplicable truths. Given that eternalists have an easy, straightforward account of truthmakers for truths about the past, presentists face a serious objection. Presentists might respond by claiming that the supervenience principles need to be appropriately modified, such that truth supervenes on not just present being, but past being as well. But this response requires that present truths stand in relations to past entities, which is impossible for presentists who do not believe in past entities. If there are no past entities, there are no past entities for present truths to supervene upon.

The second strategy for presentism is to deny that there are no presently available truthmakers for truths about the past. On this kind of account, the burden is on the presentist to offer an ontological account of what present entities are available that can provide grounds for truths about the past. An eclectic menagerie of entities has been posited by presentists over the years to serve as truthmakers. Some have suggested that the world—the present world—has a variety of ‘tensed properties’ (for example, Bigelow 1996). For example, while echidnas make true ‘There are echidnas’, the world’s having the property there having been dinosaurs makes true ‘There were dinosaurs’. Others have posited a realm of ‘tensed facts’ (for example, Tallant 2009). A tensed fact is a sui generis entity posited solely to provide a truthmaker for past truths. So the truthmaker for ‘There were dinosaurs’ is on this view just an entity of some sort that we call ‘the fact that there were dinosaurs’. Still others have suggested that, for example, God’s memory of there being dinosaurs is a truthmaker for ‘There were dinosaurs’ (for example, Rhoda 2009).

Anyone can posit an entity to be a truthmaker. Such posits constitute a genuine solution to the truthmaking challenge to presentism only if those entities are the right sorts of entities to be truthmakers, and only if they are entities whose existence is plausible and can be independently motivated (lest they remain ad hoc posits). After all, the eternalist stands ready with plausible, independently motivated truthmakers. Hence, presentists do not need to just offer some account of truthmakers for past truths; they need to provide an equally good account.

Tensed facts fail both sorts of challenges. Consider Socrates’s last moments, as the hemlock spread through his blood. During those moments, ‘Socrates exists’ was true, and made true by Socrates. A few moments later, ‘Socrates existed’ is true, and made true by a tensed fact that has just sprung into existence. That two truths so similar should be made true by such drastically different entities should be fairly disquieting. Socrates seems to be the perfect sort of thing to explain why ‘Socrates exists’ is true. After all, the sentence is about Socrates, a human being, and so a human being seems fit to provide the grounds for its truth. ‘Socrates existed’ is also about a human being, but now the supposed truthmaker is some sort of sui generis entity, something that is certainly composed in no way by a human being. There is no independent reason to believe in tensed facts; they are put forward as truthmakers for truths about the past by brute force, since it is unclear what they are apart from their stipulated role of being truthmakers for truths about the past.

Tensed property views face a similar sort of objection. ‘Socrates exists’ is true at some moment in virtue of Socrates. ‘Socrates existed’ is true the next moment, but in virtue of the world’s having some tensed property. Why, one might wonder, is not ‘Socrates exists’ true, when it is true, in virtue of the world having the tensed property presently containing Socrates? If such properties are not motivated to account for the present, it is unclear why we should posit them to account for the past.

In general, any strategy using presently existing entities to make true truths about the past will face a common explanatory problem (Sanson and Caplan 2010). Why are truths about the past true in virtue of things in the present? After all, truths about the past seem to be about the past, and so it is unclear how anything not from the past could be an adequate explanation of why they are true. Truthmakers are not mere necessitators; they have to give the right sort of grounds for their truths. God’s memory of there being Socrates certainly necessitates the truth of ‘Socrates existed’. But it is fair to claim that ‘Socrates existed’ is not true in virtue of God’s having a particular memory. (To deny this seems to accept some form of divine idealism.) So God’s memories aren’t the right kind of thing to make true ‘Socrates existed’. (To the view’s credit, the existence of God’s memories can at least be motivated independently—for anyone motivated to believe in God. The view is obviously a non-starter for naturalistic metaphysics.)

8. Truthmaking and Modality

Another traditionally problematic domain of truths are the modal claims: claims involving possibility and necessity, as well as related kinds of claims such as counterfactuals. For example, there are claims about mere possibilities, that is, possibilities that do not obtain, but could have. There are also necessary and impossible truths, and truths that those truths are necessary or impossible. Since such claims appear to concern a realm beyond the actual world, the grounds for their truth have long intrigued metaphysicians.

Though defended independently of his views about truthmaking, David Lewis’s modal realism can be put to work as a theory of truthmakers for some modal truths. According to Lewis, there exists, in addition to the actual world, infinitely many other concrete worlds. These other possible worlds are just as real as the actual world; the actual world bears no special metaphysical significance. While objects exist only in one possible world, they have counterparts in other worlds. An object’s counterparts are the entities in other possible worlds that are highly similar to the object (where similarity is explicated contextually). These counterparts can serve as truthmakers for modal truths concerning the actual world. For example, Socrates could have been a sophist. What makes that true, Lewis could maintain, is one of Socrates’s sophistic counterparts. Because there exists a counterpart of Socrates that is a sophist, ‘Socrates could have been a sophist’ is true in the actual world. At the same time, this view might face a relevance objection: the truth in question is a claim about Socrates, so how could it be made true by some individual existing in a separate, causally isolated possible world?

Armstrong hopes for a more austere account of the truthmakers for truths of mere possibility. To do this, he defends the principle that any truthmaker for a contingent truth is also a truthmaker for the truth that that truth is contingent. So, if some object X is a truthmaker for some contingent proposition that p, then X is a truthmaker for the truth that it is contingent that p. And if it is contingent that p, it follows that it is possible that it is not the case that p. X will therefore provide a truthmaker for the truth of mere possibility (assuming the truth of the right sort of entailment principle). For example, Socrates might not have been a philosopher, even though he was. Suppose the truthmaker for ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher. In that case, Socrates’s being a philosopher also makes it true that it is contingent that Socrates is a philosopher. By the entailment principle, Socrates’s being a philosopher is also a truthmaker for the claim that it is possible that Socrates is not a philosopher. In this way, Armstrong defends an account of truthmakers for truths of mere possibilities that does not employ resources above and beyond the ordinary truthmakers needed to grounds truths solely about the actual world.

As for necessary truths (and claims that such truths are necessary), most truthmaker theorists are agreed that not just any old entity will do, since mere necessitation is not sufficient for truthmaking. If it is true that God exists, and necessarily so, then presumably God is the truthmaker for such claims, not every object whatsoever. What is more contentious is what it is that makes mathematical statements true. Platonists might defend their view on the basis that numbers, understood Platonically, are necessary for giving an account of truthmakers for mathematical truths (for example, Baron 2013). Others might hope for a non-Platonic basis for mathematical truthmakers. Since it is agreed that truthmakers need to be ‘about’ or relevant to their corresponding truths, non-Platonists face the challenge of explaining how their purported truthmakers ground the truth of claims that at least appear to concern Platonic entities.

There are many more modal cases to keep truthmaker theorists busy. There are truths of natural necessity (for example, that all copper conducts electricity), conceptual truths (for example, that all bachelors are male), and logical truths (for example, that someone is human only if someone is human). All pose unique challenges for truthmaker theory.

9. Objections to Truthmaker Theory

Many philosophers are unmoved by truthmaker theory. A common thread running between the various objections that have been raised is that truthmaker theory lacks the sufficient motivation that would be necessary to justify its ontological posits. Truthmaker theory traditionally defends the existence of ontologically controversial entities (such as states of affairs or tropes), and so such posits should figure into theories only when they have some indispensable theoretical role to play. And many are convinced that no such role exists.

One line of objection maintains that truthmaker principles that are weaker than maximalism are not worthy of the name, and that the ontological posits required for maximalism are unacceptable. So no form of truthmaker theory is tenable. (See, for example, Dodd 2002 and Merricks 2007.) Such objections rely on conceptions of truthmaker theory that are substantially narrower than what is actually found in the literature; non-maximalists will be unmoved by such supposed refutations. It is up to truthmaker theorists, not their opponents, to decide who counts as a truthmaker theorist.

Another common style of objection is to claim that the intuitions behind truthmaker theory can be saved far more economically by ontologically innocuous principles (for example, Hornsby 2005). As a result, the key but controversial principles supporting truthmaker theory (and the ontological results they produce) are unmotivated, and so should be rejected. The objection runs as follows. As above, a central motivating thought behind truthmaker theory is that truth depends on reality. Maximalists account for this intuition by way of requiring that every truth be made true by some entity, in virtue of which that truth is true. Non-maximalists might look to the strong or weak supervenience principles to explain how what is true is not independent from what exists and how those things are arranged. But other philosophers find these principles to be overreactions to the idea that truth depends on being. For these philosophers, that idea is best cashed out by pointing to the instances of the following schema:

The proposition that p is true because p.

For instance, the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true because Socrates is a philosopher. According to the objection, this ‘because principle’ suffices to explain how the truth of the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher depends upon reality. After all, this maneuver seems to capture the asymmetry between truth and reality. For instances of the reverse schema are false:

p because the proposition that p is true.

It is not the case that Socrates is a philosopher because the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true. Hence, there is no need to entertain the existence of a state of affairs or trope, and no need to posit general claims about the supervenience of truth on being.

The most natural response for truthmaker theorists to make is that the above ‘because principles’ remain silent on the questions of interest to truthmaker theorists. Advocates of the objection claim that such principles express the appropriate dependency between truth and reality. But there is no mention of reality anywhere in the principles. Consider what is being expressed by the ‘because principles’. They appear to apply a relation—the ‘because’ relation—between two sentences, or perhaps two propositions. The first sentence applies truth to a proposition; the second is just the use of a sentence that expresses that proposition. The ‘because principle’ cannot be expressing a relation involving entities such as facts or states of affairs, since the objector does not believe in the need for an ontology of those kinds of things. In fact, one can endorse a ‘because principle’ without taking any metaphysical or ontological stand about anything. The sentence ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is completely silent on what exists. The sentence itself does not tell you what its ontological commitments are; one must bring to the sentence a theory of ontological commitment or truthmaking in order to determine what its metaphysical implications are. Presumably, advocates of the ‘because principles’ think that the used sentence following ‘because’ somehow involves reality. In so doing, they betray the fact that they are reading ontological implications already into the sentence. They are bringing, in other words, an implicit theory of truthmaking to the table.

Consider again the sorts of suspicious counterfactual conditionals that motivated truthmaker theory in the first place. The counterfactual ‘If I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression’ appears to be true, and true in virtue of the existence of a real, live tree in the quadrangle courtyard. That is the view that puts pressure on ontologies limited to actual sensory impressions: they have no available truthmakers for such counterfactuals, and so must take such claims to be primitive, brute truths. The objector to truthmaker theory points out that the proposition that if I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression is true because if I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression. That is true, but beside the point. It does not explain the need for something to exist in order for something to be true. We’re left wondering why I would have a tree-like sensory impression if I were to go to the quad. All the ‘because principle’ does (at least on the readings available to the objector) is cite a relation that obtains between two sentences or propositions; but truthmaker theorists are after a relation between truth and reality.

10. References and Further Reading

Armstrong, D. M. 2004. Truth and Truthmakers. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- A systematic account of truthmaker theory by one of its most established proponents.
Baron, Sam. 2013. A truthmaker indispensability argument. Synthese 190: 2413-2427.
- Argues for mathematical Platonism on the basis of certain truthmaking considerations.
Beebee, Helen and Julian Dodd. 2005. Truthmakers: The Contemporary Debate. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- An anthology of various essays both critical and supportive of truthmaker theory.
Bigelow, John. 1988. The Reality of Numbers: A Physicalist’s Philosophy of Mathematics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Defends the strong supervenience principle, offering a non-maximalist approach to truthmaker theory.
Bigelow, John. 1996. Presentism and properties. Philosophical Perspectives 10: 35-52.
- Discusses the relationship between truthmaker theory and presentism; defends the view that truths about the past have truthmakers in the present.
Cameron, Ross P. 2008. Truthmakers and ontological commitment: or how to deal with complex objects and mathematical ontology without getting into trouble. Philosophical Studies 140: 1-18.
- Defends a view that requires truthmakers to be fundamental entities.
Caplan, Ben and David Sanson. 2011. Presentism and truthmaking. Philosophy Compass 6: 196-208.
- Provides an accessible introduction to presentism and truthmaker theory.
Dodd, Julian. 2002. Is truth supervenient on being? Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (New Series) 102: 69-85.
- Argues that truthmaker theory is unmotivated.
Hornsby, Jennifer. 2005. Truth without truthmaking entities. In Truthmakers: The Contemporary Debate, eds. Helen Beebee and Julian Dodd, 33-47. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Argues that the intuitions behind truthmaking can be captured without resort to contentious ontological posits.
Lewis, David. 2001. Truthmaking and difference-making. Noûs 35: 602-615.
- Provides an important critical perspective on maximalist truthmaker theory that relies on defending the weak supervenience principle.
Lewis, David. 2003. Things qua truthmakers. In Real Metaphysics: Essays in Honour of D. H. Mellor, eds. Hallvard Lillehammer and Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, 25-42. London: Routledge.
- Provides a nominalist-friendly account of truthmaker theory that employs counterpart theory.
Lowe, E. J. 2009. An essentialist approach to truth-making. In Truth and Truth-Making, eds. E. J. Lowe and A. Rami, 201-216. Stocksfield: Acumen.
- Defends the view that the truthmaking relation is a kind of essential dependence.
Lowe, E. J. and A. Rami, eds. 2009. Truth and Truth-Making. Stocksfield: Acumen.
- An anthology of papers on truthmaker theory, including several on this list, that provides an introduction to core issues in truthmaker theory.
MacBride, Fraser. 2014. Truthmakers. In The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2014 Edition), ed. Edward N. Zalta.
- Provides a detailed overview of several main theoretical concerns within truthmaker theory.
Mellor, D. H. 2003. Real metaphysics: replies. In Real Metaphysics: Essays in Honour of D. H. Mellor, eds. Hallvard Lillehammer and Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, 212-238. London: Routledge.
- Offers an argument that the truthmaking relation does not require necessitation.
Merricks, Trenton. 2007. Truth and Ontology. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Offers a sustained and ultimately negative critical evaluation of truthmaker theory.
Milne, Peter. 2005. Not every truth has a truthmaker. Analysis 65: 221-224.
- Raises a potential paradox for maximalism.
Molnar, George. 2000. Truthmakers for negative truths. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 78: 72-86.
- Introduces and discusses the problem of negative truths for truthmaker theory.
Mulligan, Kevin, Peter Simons and Barry Smith. 1984. Truth-makers. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 44: 287-321.
- Offers a non-maximalist approach to truthmaker theory without resorting to states of affairs that begins by finding truthmakers for atomic facts.
Restall, Greg. 1996. Truthmakers, entailment and necessity. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 331-340.
- Discusses problems (such as that related to the disjunction principle) with treating the truthmaking relation merely as a relation of necessitation.
Rhoda, Alan R. 2009. Presentism, truthmakers, and God. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 90: 41-62.
- Posits the existence of God’s memories as providing presentist-friendly truthmakers for truths about the past.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006a. Truthmaker Maximalism defended. Analysis 66: 260-264.
- Defends truthmaker maximalism against Milne’s argument on the grounds that it begs the question.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006b. Truthmakers. Philosophy Compass 1: 186-200.
- Provides a highly accessible introduction to central issues in truthmaker theory.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006c. Truthmaking, entailment, and the conjunction thesis. Mind (New Series) 115: 957-982.
- Argues against certain core principles discussed in the truthmaking literature.
Russell, Bertrand. 1985. The Philosophy of Logical Atomism. ed. David Pears. La Salle, IL: Open Court.
- An early work that makes use of truthmaking ideas that gave rise to and inspired future contemporary work on truthmakers.
Ryle, Gilbert. 1949. The Concept of Mind. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- Presents Ryle’s behaviorism that becomes a later target of truthmaker theory.
Sanson, David and Ben Caplan. 2010. The way things were. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 81: 24-39.
- Argues against various defenses of truthmakers for presentism on the ground that such posits are insufficiently explanatory.
Sorensen, Roy. 2001. Vagueness and Contradiction. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- In the last chapter of this book Sorensen argues that the truthtelling sentence ‘This very sentence is true’ is a deep truthmaker gap: a truth without a truthmaker that depends in no way upon reality.
Tallant, Jonathan. 2009. Presentism and truth-making. Erkenntnis 71: 407-416.
- Discusses various strategies for presentist truthmaking.
Vision, Gerald. 2005. Deflationary truthmaking. European Journal of Philosophy 13: 364-380.
- Discusses the relationship between truthmaker theory and the deflationary theory of truth, and finds the two projects difficult to combine.

Author Information

Jamin Asay
Email: asay@hku.hk
University of Hong Kong
Hong Kong

Pejorative Language

Some words can hurt. Slurs, insults, and swears can be highly offensive and derogatory. Some theorists hold that the derogatory capacity of a pejorative word or phrase is best explained by the content it expresses. In opposition to content theories, deflationism denies that there is any specifically derogatory content expressed by pejoratives.

As noun phrases, ‘insult’ and ‘slur’ refer to symbolic vehicles designed by convention to derogate targeted individuals or groups. When used as verb phrases, ‘insult’ and ‘slur’ refer to actions performed by agents (Anderson and Lepore 2013b). Insulting or slurring someone does not require the use of language. Many different kinds of paralinguistic behavior could be used to insult_(verb)or slur_(verb) a targeted individual. Slamming a door in an interlocutor’s face is one way to insult them. Another way would be to sneer at them. Arguably, one could slur a Jewish person by performing a “Nazi salute” gesture in their presence. This article focuses on the linguistic meaning(s) that pejorative words encode as symbolic vehicles designed by convention to derogate (or harm) their targets.

Furthermore, it is important to delineate the differences between slurring and insulting. The latter is a matter of causing someone to be offended, where offense is a subjective psychological state (Hom 2012, p 397). Slurring, contrastly, does not require offending a target or eliciting any reaction whatsoever. For instance, the word ‘nigger’, used pejoratively at a Ku Klux Klan rally, derogates African Americans even if none are around to be offended by its use.

Desiderata
Content Theories
A Deflationary Theory
Broader Applications
References and Further Reading

1. Desiderata

This section focuses on five central features of pejoratives: practical features, descriptive features, embedded uses, expressive autonomy and appropriation. An explanation of these features is among the desiderata for an adequate theory of pejoratives.

a. Practical Features

There is a family of related practical features exhibited by pejoratives. First, pejoratives have the striking power to influence and motivate listeners. Insults and slurs can be used as tools for promoting destructive ways of thinking about their targets. Calling someone ‘loser’, for example, is a way of soliciting listeners to view them as undesirable, damaged, inferior, and so forth. Racial slurs have the function of propagating racism in a speech community. ‘Nigger’, for example, has the function of normalizing hateful attitudes and harmful discriminatory practices toward various “non-white” groups. Speakers have used the term to derogate African Americans, Black Africans, East Indians, Arabs, and Polynesians (among others). This is not to suggest that the derogation accomplished by means of pejoratives is always highly destructive. In some circumstances, insults like ‘asshole’ can be used to facilitate mild teasing between friends.

Second, some pejoratives tend to make listeners feel sullied. In some cases, merely overhearing a slur is sufficient for making a non-prejudiced listener feel complicit in a speaker’s slurring performance (Camp 2013) (Croom 2011). Third, different pejoratives vary in their levels of intensity (Saka 2007, p 148). For instance, ‘nigger’ is much more derogatory toward Blacks than ‘honky’ is toward Whites. Even different slurs for a particular group can vary in their derogatory intensity (for example, ‘nigger’ is more derogatory than ‘negro’). Further, pejoratives exhibit derogatory variation across time. While ‘negro’ was once used as a neutral classifying term, it is now highly offensive (Hom 2010, p 166). A successful theory of pejoratives will need to account for their various practical features.

b. Descriptive Features

Gibbard (2003) suggests that the notion of a thick ethical concept, due to Williams (1985), can shed light on the meaning of slurs. In comparison with thin ethical concepts (such as right and wrong, just and unjust), thick ethical concepts contain both evaluative and descriptive content. Paradigm examples include cruel, cowardly and unchaste. For Williams, terms that express thick ethical concepts not only play a role in prescribing and motivating action; they also purport to describe how things are. To say that a person is cruel, for example, is to say that they bring about suffering, and they are morally wrong for doing so. (For more on the distinction between thick and thin moral terms, see Metaethics.) According to Gibbard,

[r]acial epithets may sometimes work this way: where the local population stems from different far parts of the world, classification by ancestry can be factual and descriptive, but, alas, the terms people use for this are often denigrating. Nonracists can recognize things people say as truths objectionably couched. (2003, p 300)

Although Gibbard’s claim that slurring statements express truths that are “objectionably couched” is controversial, it does seem that slurs classify their respective targets. A speaker who calls an Italian person ‘spic’ does not merely say something offensive and derogatory – said speaker simulateneously makes a factual error in classifying his target incorrectly. Similarly, the insult ‘moron’ appears to both ascribe a low level of intelligence to its targets and evaluate them negatively for it. Additionally, as the following example illustrates, some swear words seem to contain descriptive content:

(1) A: Tom fucked Jerry for the first time last week.

B: No, they fucked for the second time last week; the first was two months ago.

Also, consider the following example (Hom 2010, p 170):

(2) Random fucking is risky behavior.

There appears to be genuine disagreement between A and B in (1) and someone who asserts (2) has surely made a claim capable of being true or false. A successful theory of pejoratives should explain, or explain away, apparent descriptive, truth-conditional features.

c. Embedded Uses

Potts (2007) observes that most pejoratives appear to exhibit nondisplaceability: the use of a pejorative is derogatory even as an embedded term in a larger construction. An indirect report or a conditional sentence are often vehicles of nondisplacibility; direct quotations, however, are excluded. Consider, for example, that Sue has uttered (3) and another speaker attempts to report on her utterance with (4):

(3) That asshole Steve is on time today.

(4) Sue said that that asshole Steve is on time today.

As long as the occurrence of ‘asshole’ is not read as implicitly metalinguistic—with a change in intonation or an accompanying gesture indicating that the speaker wishes to distance herself from any negative feelings toward Steve—listeners will interpret the speaker of (4) as making a disparaging remark about Steve, even if the speaker is merely attempting to report on Sue’s utterance.

Like the insult ‘asshole’, the gendered slur ‘bitch’ appears to scope out of indirect reports. Suppose Eric utters (5) and someone tries to report on his utterance with (6):

(5) A bitch ran for President of the United States in 2008.

(6) Eric said that a bitch ran for President of the United States in 2008.

It would be difficult to use (6) to give a neutral (non-sexist) report of Eric’s offensive claim. Unless a metalinguistic reading is available for the occurrence of ‘bitch’, anyone who utters (6) in an attempt to report on Eric’s utterance of (5) risks making an offensive claim about women (Anderson and Lepore 2013a, p 29).

Potts claims that one way in which pejoratives are nondisplaceable is that they always tell us about the current utterance situation (2007, p 169-71). Consider

(7) That bastard Kresge was late for work yesterday (#But he’s no bastard today, because he was on time)

Despite the fact that ‘bastard’ is within the scope of a tense operator in (7), it would be implausible to read the speaker as claiming that she disliked Kresge only in the past, as the defective parenthetical (indicated by the hash sign) illustrates.

However, not all pejoratives behave the same way when embedded. Consider (8)-(11):

(8) If Steve doesn’t finish his report by the end of the week, he’s fucked (but I suspect he’ll finish on time.)

(9) Suppose our new employee, Steve, is a bastard (On the other hand, maybe he’ll be nice)

(10) Steve is not a bastard (I think he’s a good guy).

(11) Steve used to be a real fucker in law school (but I like him much better now).

A speaker who utters (8)-(11) need not be said to have made a disparaging claim about Steve. This is because the occurrences of ‘fucked’, ‘bastard’, and ‘fucker’ in (8)-(11) appear to be “narrow-scoping” (Hom 2012, p.387). Thus, at least some embedded uses of pejoratives seem not to commit the speaker to an offensive claim (compare the non-defective parentheticals in these cases with the defective one in (7)).

Slurring words, however, appear to behave differently. As (12) and (13) illustrate, slurs are just as offensive and derogatory when uttered as part of a supposition or embedded in a conditional sentence as when they are used in predicative assertions:

(12) If the guys standing at the end of my driveway are spics, I’ll tell them to leave (#Fortunately, there is no such thing as a spic, since no one is inferior for being Hispanic)

(13) Suppose the next job applicant is a nigger. (#Of course that won’t happen, since no one is inferior for being Black.)

Notice the defectiveness of the parentheticals as attempts to cancel the derogatoriness of the preceding sentences. In general, slurs appear to take wide scope relative to all truth-conditional operators, including negation. Consider the following explicit attempt to reject a racist claim:

(14) It is not the case that Ben is a kike; he is not Jewish!

(14) fails to undermine the derogatoriness of the slur ‘kike’. Seemingly, the trouble is that it only disavows a derogatory way of thinking about Ben, and so it cannot be used to reject a racist attitude toward Jews in general (Camp 2013). Further, as Saka (2007, p 122) observes, even Tarskian disquotational sentences containing slurs appear to express hostility:

(15) “Nietzsche was a kraut” is true iff Nietzsche was a kraut.

A successful theory of pejoratives must explain the behavior of embedded pejorative words and phrases, and more specifically, must account for the fact that slurring words and insulting words appear to behave differently within the scope of truth-conditional and intensional operators. A successful theory must also resolve the apparent tension between the putative descriptive features of slurs, and their behavior under embedding.

d. Expressive Autonomy

The expressive power of a pejorative term is autonomous to the extent that it is independent of the attitudes of particular speakers who use the term. Slurring words appear to exhibit derogatory autonomy– their derogatory capacity is independent of the attitudes of speakers who use them (Hom 2008, p426). For instance, a racist who intends to express affection toward Italians by asserting, ‘I love wops; they are my favorite people on Earth’, has still used the slur in a patently offensive manner (Anderson and Lepore 2013a, p33). Likewise, a competent speaker who knows that ‘kike’ is a term of abuse for Jews could not stipulate a non-derogatory meaning by uttering, “What’s wrong with saying that kikes are smart? By ‘kike’, I just mean Jews, and Jews are smart, aren’t they?” (Saka 2007, p 148).

e. Appropriation

Some pejoratives are used systematically to accomplish aims other than those for which they were designed. Appropriation refers to the various systematic ways in which agents repurpose pejorative language. For certain slurs, the target group takes over the term to transform its meaning to lessen or to eliminate its derogatory force. This is one variety of appropriation known as linguistic reclamation(Brontsema 2004). The term ‘queer’ is a paradigm case. Although ‘queer’ once derogated those who engaged in sexually abnormal behavior, the term ‘queer’ now contains little to no derogatory force as a result of homosexual women and men appropriating the term. Now, non-prejudiced speakers can use the term ‘queer’ in a various contexts. For instance, phrases such as ‘queer studies program’ and ‘queer theory’ do not derogate homosexuals. In contrast, the slur ‘nigger’ -often marked by an alternative spelling ‘nigga’- has been appropriated more exclusively by the target group, and is often used as a means of expressing camaraderie between group members (Saka 2007, p145). Barring a few rare exceptions, targeted speakers can use the term to refer to one another in a non-denigrating way. Appropriated uses of ‘nigger’ are common in comedic performances and satire. The use of ‘nigger’ in a comedy bit designed to mock and criticize racism need not commit the speaker to racist attitudes (Richard 2008, p.12).

Insults are also subject to appropriation. In some contexts, an insult can be used to express something more jocular or affectionate than hateful, such as in the phrase: ‘George is the most lovable bastard I know’. A successful theory of these phenomena need to account for their various appropriated uses.

2. Content Theories

According to content theories, pejorative words are derogatory in virtue of the content they express. This section contains an overview and discussion of several content theories and their merits, followed by standard criticisms.

a. Pejorative Content as Fregean Coloring

For Gottlob Frege, two aspects to the meaning of a term are its reference and its sense. The reference is what the term denotes, while the sense provides instructions for picking out the reference. (For more on this distinction see Gottlob Frege: Language.) Additionally, Frege posited an expressive realm of meaning separate from sense and reference. For Frege, a word’s färbung (often translated as ‘coloring’ or ‘shading’) is constituted by the negative or positive psychological states associated with it that play no role in determining the truth-value of utterances that include it. The terms ‘dog’ and ‘cur’, for example, share the same sense and reference, but the latter has a negative coloring – something like disgust or contempt for the targeted canine (Frege 1892, p.240). Likewise for the neutral term ‘English’ and the slur ‘Limey’, which was once applied exclusively to English sailors, but now targets English people generally:

(16) Mary is English.

(17) Mary is a Limey.

For Frege, both (16) and (17) are true just in case Mary is English. However, for most speakers, ‘English’ is neutral in coloring, while ‘Limey’ is associated with negative feelings for English people.

Although the Fregean approach accounts for the descriptive features of pejoratives as well as the behavior of slurs when embedded, most contemporary theorists reject it (see, for example, Hom (2008)). For Frege, “coloring and shading are not objective, and must be evoked by each hearer or reader” (1897, p 155). On his view, a pejorative term’s coloring is not conventional (in any sense of the term); rather, coloring consists only in subjective (non-conventional) associations speakers have with the term. Dummett (1981) diagnoses the problem with positing an essentially subjective realm of meaning: the meaning of a linguistic sign or symbol cannot be in principle subjective, since it is what speakers conveyto listeners. Given the subjective nature of coloring, Fregeans are committed to holding that the derogatory power of slurs is due to subjective associations held by speakers and listeners. As a result, Fregeans will have difficulty accounting for expressive autonomy (Hom 2008, p 421). For instance, Fregeans will have trouble explaining why ‘nigger’ can be just as derogatory in the mouth of a racist as it is when uttered by a non-racist. In reply, Fregeans might offer a dispositional theory of coloring. Consider an analogy with a dispositional theory of color, according to which a thing is yellow, for example, if it disposes normal agents in appropriate conditions to have a qualitative experience of yellow. Similarly, Fregeans might hold that a slur S has a negative coloring to the extent that uttering or hearing S disposes speakers and listeners to have derogatory attitudes toward the target. This approach could generalize to other pejorative terms. Consider Frege’s example of ‘cur’. On the revised version of the theory, ‘cur’ has a negative coloring to the extent that competent listeners who hear the term predicated of a dog are disposed to think of the targeted canine as flea-ridden, mangy, and dangerous. Such an account might be promising, but much more would need to be said about how hearing the word disposes listeners to think in derogatory ways. As it stands, the Fregean view does little to explain how pejoratives can be so rhetorically powerful.

b. Expressivism

Another main theory of pejoratives is a descendent of the metaethical view known as expressivism. According to the version of expressivism developed by Ayer (1936), moral and aesthetic statements do not express propositions capable of being true or false, and merely serve to express and endorse the speaker’s own moral sentiments. For Ayer, an assertion of ‘Stealing is wrong’ does not express a truth-evaluable proposition; rather, it merely expresses the speaker’s disapproval of stealing. (For more on expressivism, see Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.)

One might extend Ayer’s expressivism to cover pejoratives. On this view, derogatory statements containing pejoratives do not express propositions capable of being true or false – they merely express a non-cognitive attitude, such as disapproval, of the target group. An expressivist theory of pejoratives is well suited to explain the behavior of slurs under embedding. However, it will have difficulty accounting for their descriptive features. As noted above, a speaker who calls an Italian person ‘spic’ has seemingly made a classificatory error. If slurs lack descriptive content, and merely serve to express non-cognitive attitudes, then it is unclear how they could classify their targets.

Saka (2007) offers an alternative, hybrid expressivist theory of slurs, according to which slurs contain both expressive and descriptive content (see also Kaplan (2004)). Saka denies that there is a single belief or proposition expressed by slurring statements such as ‘Nietzsche was a kraut’. Rather, such statements express an attitude complex, which includes (i) the pure belief that Nietzsche was German, and (ii) a cognitive-affective state toward Germans (Saka 2007, p 143). Saka’s hybrid theory could plausibly account for the descriptive, truth-conditional features of pejoratives.

However, it is not clear that either the pure expressivist theory of pejoratives or Saka’s hybrid theory can extend to all pejoratives. According to a standard objection to metaethical expressivism, the so-called Frege-Geach problem, one can utter a sentence containing a moral predicate (such as ‘good’, ‘evil’, ‘right’, and ‘wrong’) as the antecedent or consequent of a conditional sentence without making a moral judgment. Expressivists about moral terms are unable to account for the sameness of content in both asserted and non-asserted contexts, so the objection goes. For example, as Geach (1965) observed, the following is a valid argument:

(18) If tormenting the cat is wrong, then getting your brother to do it is wrong.

(19) Tormenting the cat is wrong.

(20) Therefore, getting your brother to do it is wrong.

If, as the metaethical expressivist claims, ‘wrong’ merely expresses a speaker’s approval, then it is a mystery how the term ‘wrong’ could carry the same content in (19) and when embedded in the antecedent of the conditional sentence in (18), given that (19) expresses a moral judgment while (18) does not. Hom (2010) argues that expressivist theories of swears face a similar challenge. Consider the following argument:

(21) If George fucked up his presentation, he will be fired.

(22) George fucked up his presentation.

(23) Therefore, he will be fired.

In order for this argument to be valid, the pejorative term ‘fucked’ must have the same semantic content in (21) and (22), despite the fact that (21) does not express a negative attitude about George, while (22) does. It is difficult to see how the pure expressivist theory could account for this. Although Saka’s hybrid theory has the potential to explain the preservation of content between (21) and (22), his view will have difficulty accounting for the fact that (21) expresses no negative attitude about George.

Additionally, one might worry that the non-cognitive attitudes posited by expressivism are too underspecified to account for derogatory variation (‘kraut’ is less derogatory than ‘nigger’ is, and so forth). Do all pejoratives express something like ‘contempt’ or ‘hostility’ or do the negative attitudes differ for each term? Saka claims that derogatory variation among slurs is due to the historical circumstances that led to their introduction and sustain their derogatory power (Saka 2007, p148). But the appeal to historical context here is illicit if the derogatoriness of slurs is to be explained by an attitude complex expressed by speakers who use the term. After appealing to external institutions to explain the derogatory features of slurs, it appears that the posited attitude complex has no remaining explanatory work.

Finally, expressivists need to do more to explain how the expression of negative attitudes relates to the practical features of slurs. In particular, they need to specify a notion of expression that makes it clear how the expression of hostility (or contempt, and so forth) toward a target could motivate listeners to feel similarly.

c. Slurs and Truth-Value Gaps

Richard (2008) holds that slurs express derogatory attitudes toward their targets, but unlike Saka he claims that slurs lack truth-conditional content. Richard is not a pure expressivist, since he does not take the derogatory content of slurs to be a negative affective state. He denies that slurring speech is false by claiming that to apply the term ‘false’ to an utterance is to claim that the speaker made an error that can be corrected by judicious use of negation. Nevertheless, examples like “My neighbor isn’t a chink; she’s Japanese,” suggest that it cannot. Richard also denies that derogatory statements containing slurs can be true. He acknowledges that predicating a slur of someone entails classifying him or her as a member of a particular group, but he denies that correct classification suffices for truth. For instance, Richard holds that the anti-Semite can correctly classify a person as Jewish by calling them ‘kike’, but when a speaker slurs a Jewish person with ‘kike’, they have not simply classified them as Jewish nor have they merely expressed an affective state (like hatred or contempt) – they have misrepresented the target as being despicable for being Jewish. According to Richard, we cannot endorse the classification as true without also endorsing the representation as accurate. On his view, whatever truth belongs to a classification is truth it inherited from the thought expressed in making it, and the thought expressed by the anti-Semite who uses the slur ‘kike’ is the mistaken thought that Jews are despicable for being Jewish (Richard 2008, p. 24).

Although Richard’s view could potentially make sense of the behavior of slurs under embedding, he does not offer a positive theory of how slurs represent their targets. He might hold that the relevant sort of representation is imagistic. Perhaps hearing a slur puts an unflattering image of the target group in the minds of listeners. In any event, Richard offers no help here. Instead, he is interested only in establishing that there are numerous statements – among them, derogatory statements containing slurs – that have a determinate content, yet are not truth-apt. Others include applications of vague predicates to borderline cases and statements that give rise to liar paradoxes. As it stands, nothing in Richard’s view helps us see how misrepresenting a target by means of calling them a pejorative word has the power to motivate listeners to think derogatory thoughts about them. Thus, Richard’s view leaves the practical features of slurs unexplained.

Further, there are reasons to be doubtful of Richard’s claim that slurs always misrepresent their targets. While this claim seems plausible in the case of racial slurs, it is not obviously true of all slurring words. Consider ‘fascist’, which is a slur for officials in an authoritarian political system. On Richard’s view, to call Mussolini and Hitler fascists is to represent them as contemptible for their political affiliation. Presumably, this would not be to misrepresent them. Richard might agree, and respond that the concept of truth is not what we should use when evaluating a slurring performance as accurate or inaccurate. In that case, Richard still owes a positive account of how such words can accurately represent their targets. Absent these details, it is difficult to evaluate Richard’s claims.

d. A Gestural Theory

Hornsby (2001) offers a theory of the derogatory content of slurs, but her view could be extended to cover other pejoratives:

It is as if someone who used, say, the word ‘nigger’ had made a particular gesture while uttering the word’s neutral counterpart. An aspect of the word’s meaning is to be thought of as if it were communicated by means of this (posited) gesture. The gesture is made, ineludibly, in the course of speaking, and is thus to be explicated…in illocutionary terms. (p 140)

According to Hornsby, the gestural content of a slur cannot be captured in terms of a proposition or thought. Rather, “the commitments incurred by someone who makes the gesture are commitments to targeted emotional attitudes” (2001, p140). Hornsby’s gestural theory has the potential to account for slurs’ expressive autonomy and their offensiveness when embedded. Unfortunately, Hornsby’s central thesis is unclear. On one interpretation, she holds that a speaker who uses a slur actually performs a pejorative gesture in the course of uttering it, although the gesture itself is elliptical. On another interpretation, she is claiming only that using a slur is analogous to performing a derogatory gesture. For either interpretation, there is a lacunae in Hornsby’s theory. If the first interpretation is what Hornsby intends, she owes an account of what the posited gestures are supposed to be. Perhaps she thinks that to call an African American ‘nigger’ is to perform an elliptical “throat slash” in their direction (Hom 2008, p418). Or maybe uttering ‘nigger’ amounts to giving targets “the finger”. If this is what Hornsby intends, she owes an account of how it is possible to perform an elided gesture. On the other hand, if Hornsby is merely claiming that derogatory uses of slurs are analogous to pejorative gestures, she needs to specify how tight the analogy is.

e. A Perspectival Theory

Camp (2013) offers a perspectival theory of slurs. On her view, slurs are so rhetorically powerful because they signal allegiance to a perspective, which is an integrated, intuitive way of thinking about the target group (p335). For Camp, a speaker who slurs some group G non-defeasibly signals his affiliation with a way of thinking and feeling about Gs as a whole (p340). The perspectival account offers an explanation for why slurs produce a feeling of complicity in their hearers, that is, why non-racist listeners tend to feel implicated in a speaker’s slurring performance. Camp describes two kinds of complicity. First, there is cognitive complicity:

The nature of semantic understanding, along with the fact that perspectives are intuitive cognitive structures only partially under conscious control, means that simply hearing a slur activates an associated perspective in the mind of a linguistically and culturally competent hearer. This in turn affects the hearer’s own intuitive patterns of thought: she now thinks about G’s in general, about the specific G (if any) being discussed, and indeed about anyone affiliated with Gs in the slurs’ light, however little she wants to. (p343)

Second, there is social complicity: the fact that there exists a word designed by convention to express the speaker’s perspective indicates that the perspective is widespread in the hearer’s culture, and being reminded of this may be painful for non-prejudiced listeners (Camp 2013, p344; see also Saka 2007, p 142). Camp’s theory also has the potential to explain linguistic reclamation. When a slur is taken over by its target group and its pejorative meaning is transformed; the derogatory perspective it once signaled becomes detached and the term comes to signal allegiance to a neutral (or positive) perspective on the target.

One might take issue with Camp’s claim that complicity is due to speakers signaling the presence of racist attitudes. In general, merely signaling one’s own perspective is insufficient for generating complicity. For instance, one might signal one’s libertarian political perspective by placing a ‘Ron Paul’ bumper sticker on one’s car, yet this behavior is not likely to make observers feel complicit in the expression of a libertarian perspective. Even signaling one’s racist attitudes need not lead others to feel complicit. For instance, one might overtly signal a racist perspective by refusing to sit next to members of a certain race on a bus or by crossing the street whenever a member of a certain race is walking toward them; however, in most cases, this sort of behavior is not likely to activate a derogatory perspective in observers or make observers feel complicit. Thus, the fact that slurs signal a derogatory perspective, if it is a fact, does not explain why slurs tend to make listeners feel complicit in the expression of a derogatory attitude.

f. Implicature Theories

In some cases, what a speaker means is not exhausted by what she literally says. Grice (1989) distinguishes what a speaker literally says with her words from what she implies or suggests with them. Grice posited two kinds of implicature: conversational and conventional. When a speaker communicates something by means of conversational implicature, she violates (or makes as if to violate) a conversational norm, such as provide as much information as is required given the aim of the conversation. The hearer, working on the assumption that the speaker is being cooperative, attempts to derive the implicatum (that is, what the speaker meant, but did not literally say) based on the words used by the speaker and what conversational norm she has (apparently) violated. Suppose that Professor A has written a letter of recommendation for her philosophy student, X, that reads, “Mr. X’s command of English is excellent, and his attendance at tutorials has been regular” (Grice 1989, p 33). The reader, recognizing that A does not wish to opt out, will observe that she has apparently violated the maxim of quantity: seemingly, she has not provided enough information about X’s philosophical abilities for the reader to make an assessment. The most reasonable explanation for A’s behavior is that she thinks X is a rather bad student, but is reluctant to explicitly say so, since doing so would entail saying something impolite or violating some other norm. According to Grice, sometimes the conventional meaning of a term determines what is implied by usage of the word, in addition to determining what is said by it. If a sentence s conventionally implies that Q, then it is possible to find another sentence s*, which is truth-conditionally equivalent to s, yet does not imply that Q. Consider the sentences ‘Alexis is rich and kind’ and ‘Alexis is rich, but kind’. For Grice, these two sentences have the same literal truth-conditions (they are true just in case Alexis is both rich and kind), but only the latter implies that there is a contrast between being rich and kind (in virtue of the conventional meaning of ‘but’). (For more on Grice’s theory of implicature, see Philosophy of Language.)

One might apply Grice’s theory of implicature to pejoratives. A theory that understands pejorative content as conversationally implicated content has little chance of succeeding. First, it seems that the pejorative meaning of a slur needn’t be worked out by the listener in the way that a conversational implicature must be (Saka 2007, p136). Second, conversational implicata are supposed to be cancellable, but the derogatory content of a slur is not (Hom 2008, p434). According to Grice, for any putative conversational implicatureP, it will always be possible to explicitly cancel P by adding something like ‘but not P’ or ‘I do not mean to imply that P’. And it is clear that the derogatory contents of slurs are not explicitly cancellable, as the following defective example illustrates: ‘That house is full of kikes, but I don’t mean to disparage Jewish people’.

Stenner (1981), Whiting (2007, 2013) and Williamson (2009) have argued that the derogatory content of some pejorative words and phrases is best understood in terms of conventional implicature. According to a conventional implicature account of slurs (hereafter, the ‘CI account’), slurs and their neutral counterparts have the same literal meaning, but slurs conventionally imply something negative that their neutral counterparts do not. For instance, ‘Franz was German’ and ‘Franz was a Boche’ are the same at the level of what is said – they have the same literal truth-conditions, that is, they are both true just in case Franz was German. But ‘Franz was a Boche’ conventionally implies the false and derogatory propositionthat Franz was cruel and despicable because he was German. One virtue of the CI account is that it explains the descriptive features of pejoratives as well as expressive autonomy.

One objection to the CI account is that it is controversial whether there is any such thing as conventional implicature. Bach (1999) argues that putative cases of conventional implicature are actually part of what is said by an utterance. Bach devised the indirect quotation (IQ) test for conventionally implicated content. Suppose that speaker A has uttered (24), and speaker B has reported on A’s utterance with (25):

(24) She is wise, but short.

(25) A said that she is wise and short.

According to Bach, since B has left out important information in her indirect report, namely information about the purported contrast between being wise and short, that information must have been part of what was said, as opposed to what was implied, by A’s utterance. Hom (2008) uses Bach’s IQ test to undermine the CI account of slurs. Suppose A uttered (26) and B reported on A’s utterance with (27):

(26) Bill is a spic.

(27) A said that Bill is Hispanic.

According to Hom, since B has misreported A, the derogatory content of the slur must be part of what is said, and so the CI account fails. Notice, however, that Hom’s use of Bach’s test does not show that the derogatoriness of slurs must be part of their literal semantic content, since “what is said” could refer to pragmatically enriched content (see, for example, Bach (1994)). A more serious objection is that even if Griceans are correct in holding that an utterance of ‘Italians are wops’ carries a negative implicature about Italians, more would need to be said in order to explain how implying something negative about Italians could bring about complicity in listeners, and motivate listeners to discriminate against Italians. Consider a paradigm case of conventional implicature: a speaker who asserts ‘P but Q’ commits herself to a contrast between P and Q by virtue of the conventional meaning of ‘but’. However, there is no reason to think that bystanders would automatically feel complicit in the speaker’s claim. Yet listeners often find themselves feeling complicit in the expression of a negative attitude just by overhearing a slur. Even if terms like ‘but’ are capable of triggering a kind of complicity, it is surely not the robust sort of complicity triggered by slurs. Potts (2007) offers a non-propositional version of the CI account. Potts understands pejorative content in terms of expressive indices, which model a speaker’s negative (or positive) attitudes in a conversational context. He offers the following schema for an expressive index:

<a I b>

where a and b are individuals, and I is an interval that represents a’s positive or negative feelings for b in the conversational context. The more narrow the interval, the more intense the feeling. If I = [-1, 1], then ais essentially indifferent toward b. If I = [0.8, 1], then a has a highly positive attitude toward b. If I = [-0.5, 0], then a has negative feelings for b. For Potts, the conventionally implicated content of a pejorative is a function that alters the expressive index of a conversational context. So, for example, if Bill calls George a ‘spic’, the expressive index might shift from <Bill [-1, 1] George>, where Bill is indifferent to George, to <Bill [-0.5, 0] George>, where Bill has negative feelings toward George. Potts’s theory could potentially account for complicity. He might argue that a feeling of complicity results from taking part in a conversation whose expressive index has been lowered due to the use of a slur. One problem with Potts’s theory is that expressive indices are supposed to measure psychological states of conversation participants, and these can depend on a variety of idiosyncratic features of the participants – their background beliefs, values, and so forth. This makes it difficult to see how the expressive content of pejoratives could be objective and speaker-independent (Hom 2010, p180).

Additionally, Potts’s numerical modeling of attitudes seems too coarse-grained to explain the differences between slurs and other pejoratives. One could shift the expressive index of a conversation by using an insult like ‘asshole’ or even by using non-pejorative language. For instance, Bill might lower the expressive index in a conversation about his colleague, George, by pointing out that George is late for work and that he’s not dressed appropriately for the office. Bill could also lower the index by uttering, ‘Here comes George!’ in a contemptuous tone of voice. If Potts is correct, the pejorative content of slurs like ‘nigger’, ‘chink’, and ‘spic’ should be understood in terms of expressive indices. However, in that case, Potts will have difficulty explaining the distinctively racist nature of these words, which derogate individuals qua members of particular racial groups.

g. A Presupposition Theory

In the philosophical literature, to presuppose a proposition P is to take P for granted in a way that contrasts with asserting that P (Soames 1989, p.553). According to one widely accepted theory, presupposed content is best understood in terms of attitudes and background beliefs of speakers. According to Robert Stalnaker’s theory of pragmatic presupposition, each conversation is governed by a conversational record, which includes the common ground, that is, the background assumptions mutually accepted by participants for the purposes of the conversation. The pragmatic presuppositions of an utterance are the requirements it places on sets of common background assumptions built up among conversational participants (Soames 1989, p.556). Mutually accepted background assumptions are subject to change over the course of a conversation. Lewis (1979) observes that information can be added to (or removed from) the conversational record when necessary in order to forestall presupposition failure and make what is said conversationally acceptable. For instance, if a speaker says, ‘Avery broke the copy machine’ in the course of a conversation, and it was not already mutually understood by the speaker and her listeners that a copy machine was damaged, then it will be assumed for the purposes of the conversation that some salient copy machine was broken. Schlenker (2007) argues that pejorative content is best understood in terms of presupposition. Consider how the presupposition theory covers slurs. Suppose (28) is asked in a conversation:

(28) Was there a honky on the subway today?

According to Schlenker, if none of the conversation participants dissent, a derogatory proposition (or set of such propositions) – for example, that Caucasians are despicable for being Caucasian, that the speaker and the audience are willing to treat Caucasians as despicable – is incorporated into common ground.

There are several problems with the presupposition theory of pejoratives. First, as Potts (2007), Hom (2010), and Anderson and Lepore (2013a) observe, presuppositions can be cancelled when sentences that trigger them are embedded in an indirect report, but the derogatoriness of embedded slurs cannot be cancelled. Compare (29) with (30):

(29) Frank believes that John stopped smoking, but John has never smoked.

(30) #Eric said that a nigger is in the white house, but Blacks are not inferior for being Black.

Ordinarily, an assertion of ‘John stopped smoking’ presupposes that John previously smoked. When embedded in an indirect report, however, the presupposition can be cancelled, as (29) illustrates. In contrast, (30) appears to convey something highly offensive, which cannot be cancelled by the right conjunct. If the presupposition account were correct, we would expect (30) to be inoffensive and non-derogatory. Also, as Richard (2008) has observed, derogation with slurs needn’t be a rational, cooperative effort between speakers. According to Richard,

[a] pretty good rule of thumb is that someone who is using these words is insulting and being hostile to their targets. But there is a rather large gap between doing that and putting something on the conversational record. If I yell ‘Smuck!’ at someone who cuts me off…[a]m I entitled to assume, if you don’t say ‘He’s not a smuck’, that you assume that the person in question is a smuck, or are hostile towards him? Surely not. (2008, pp.21-2)

h. Inferentialism

Inferentialism is the thesis that knowing the meaning of a statement is a matter of knowing the conditions under which one is justified in making the statement; and the consequences of accepting it, which include both the inferential powers of the statement and anything that counts as acting on the truth of the statement (Dummett 1981, p 453). In this view, one knows the meaning of the term ‘valid’, for example, if one knows the criteria for applying ‘valid’ to arguments, and one understanding the consequences of such an application, namely that an argument’s validity provides a basis for accepting its conclusion so long as one accepts its premises.

Dummett (1981) offers an inferentialist account of slurs (see also Tirrell (1999) and Brandom (2000)). Dummett posits two inference rules for slurs: an introduction rule and an elimination rule. The introduction rule gives sufficient conditions for applying the slur to someone and the elimination rule specifies what one commits oneself to by doing so. Consider the slur ‘boche’, which was once commonly applied to people of German origin:

The condition for applying the term to someone is that he is of German nationality; the consequences of its application are that he is barbarous and more prone to cruelty than other Europeans. We should envisage the connections in both directions as sufficiently tight as to be involved in the very meaning of the word: neither could be severed without altering its meaning (454).

Williamson (2009) formalizes Dummett’s inference rules for ‘boche’ as follows:

Boche introduction:

x is a German

Therefore, x is a boche

Boche elimination:

x is a boche

Therefore, x is cruel

Brandom (2000) endorses the inferentialist account of slurs, and notes a sense in which slurs are unsayable for non-prejudiced speakers. On his view, once one uses a term like ‘boche’, one commits oneself to the thought that Germans are cruel because of being German. The only recourse for non-xenophobic speakers, Brandom concludes, is to refuse to employ the concept, since it embodies an inference one does not endorse. The inferentialist theory is well suited to explain the descriptive features of slurs as well as expressive autonomy. The theory also accounts for why a slur is derogatory toward an entire group of individuals, even when a speaker intends only to derogate a single person in a particular context with the term.

However, there are numerous objections to the inferentialist’s treatment of slurs. First, Hornsby (2001) questions whether it is possible to spell out for every slur the consequences to which its users are committed. Further, as Williamson (2009) observes, a speaker might grow up in a community where only the pejorative word for a group is used. For instance, someone may only know Germans as people who are ‘boche’ without knowing the term ‘Germans’. In that case, the speaker could be competent with ‘boche’ (she could know that it is a xenophobic term of abuse) without knowing the word ‘German’. Thus, knowing the ‘boche-introduction’ rule is not necessary for competency with the slur.

i. Combinatorial Externalism

Hom (2008) offers a theory of the semantic content of slurs. According to Hom, the derogatory content of a pejorative term is wholly constituted by its literal meaning. Hom makes use of the semantic externalist framework first developed by Putnam (1975) and Kripke (1980). Semantic externalism holds that the internal state of the particular speaker of a word does not fully determine the word’s meaning, which is instead determined, at least partly, by external social practices of the linguistic community to which the word actively belongs. For more on semantic externalism, see Internalism and Externalism in the Philosophy of Mind and Language. According to Putnam (1975), one can competently use terms like ‘elm’ and ‘beech’ without understanding the complex biological properties of each kind of tree, as long as one stands in the right sort of causal relation to the social institutions that determine their meaning. Similarly, according to Hom, the meaning of a slur is determined by a social institution of racism that is constituted by a racist ideology and a set of harmful discriminatory practices. Hom offers the following formal schema for the semantic content of slurs:

Ought to be subject to p*₁ + … + p*_n because of being d*₁ + … + d*_nall because of being NPC*,

where p*₁ + … + p*_nare prescriptions for harmful discriminatory treatment derived from a set of racist practices, d*₁ + … + d*_nare negative properties derived from a racist ideology, and NPC* is the semantic value of the slur’s neutral counterpart (Hom 2008, p.431). Hom calls his view Combinatorial Externalism (CE). On this view, ‘chink’ expresses the following complex, socially constructed property as part of its literal meaning: ought to be subject to higher college admissions standards, excluded from managerial positions…, because of being slanty-eyed, devious…, all because of being Chinese.

According to Hom, one motivation for CE is that it accounts for the common intuition that slurs have empty extensions. A non-racist might say ‘There are no chinks; there are only Chinese.’ Given that no one ought to be subject to discriminatory practices because of their race, CE predicts that all racial slurs have null extensions. Hom’s semantic analysis also accounts for expressive autonomy, since the social institutions that determine the meanings of slurs are independent of the attitudes of particular speakers. Finally, CE accounts for non-derogatory, appropriated uses of slurs by in-group members. For Hom, when a targeted group appropriates a slur, they create a new supporting social institution for the term which imbues the term with a new (non-pejorative) semantic content.

Hom (2012) extends CE to cover swears. Consider Hom’s analysis of ‘John fucked Mary’:

to say that John fucked Mary is to say (something like) that they each ought to be scorned, ought to go to hell, ought to be treated as less desirable (if female), ought to be treated as more desirable (if male), ought to be treated as damaged (if female), …, for being sinful, unchaste, lustful, impure, … because of having sexual intercourse with each other. (Hom 2012, p 395)

In speech communities wherein ideologies support progressive ideas about sex and reject the meaning of the term, the term will come to have a different semantic content because the above prescriptions will no longer be a part of the semantic content of ‘fucked’.

CE faces several objections. First, the behavior of embedded slurs poses a problem for CE (see Richard (2008), Jeshion (2013) and Whiting (2013)). According to Hom (2012), derogation requires the actual predication of a slur to a targeted individual. Notice that a speaker who utters (31) has not literally assigned negative properties to anyone or prescribed negative practices for anyone, yet the utterance appears to be highly offensive and derogatory:

(31) If there are any spics among the job applicants, do not hire them.

If Hom is correct, non-prejudiced speakers should be able to endorse utterances like (31), since they would be true, given their false antecedents (Richard 2008, p17). In response, Hom (2012) suggests that wide-scoping intuitions about pejoratives can be explained by what they conversationally imply. (31) indicates that the speaker thinks that some Hispanic individuals are inferior and ought to be excluded from employment opportunities. However, if this is correct, there should be contexts where the speaker can felicitously follow up her utterance with ‘not that I mean to imply that Hispanic people are inferior or that they should be discriminated against’, since conversational implicata are cancellable. But the use of the slur in (31) seems non-defeasibly racist and derogatory. As Jeshion (2013) observes, following the utterance up with ‘but I don’t mean to imply anything derogatory’ does not get the speaker off the hook.

Finally, Jeshion (2013) objects that CE’s account of the semantic content of slurs has it backwards. She argues that ideologies and social practices must antedate slurs, and this is a problem because the use of a slur for a particular group often plays a role in the creation and development of such institutions and practices. If so, a social institution could not be the source of a slur’s pejorative content.

3. A Deflationary Theory

Anderson and Lepore (2013a, 2013b) deny that the characteristic features of slurs are due to the contents they express. Their proposal is simply that “slurs are prohibited words; as such, their uses are offensive to whomever these prohibitions matter” (2013a, p.21). Anderson and Lepore note that quotation does not always eliminate the offensiveness of pejoratives (see also Saka 1998, p.122). An utterance of (32), for example, would be offensive despite the quotational use of the slur it contains:

(32) ‘Nigger’ is a term for blacks.

Anderson and Lepore argue that content theorists will have difficulty accounting for the widespread practice of avoiding the word ‘nigger’ completely (using the locution ‘the N-word’ in place of quoting the term).

Deflationism accounts for the behavior of embedded slurs. However, it faces several objections. First, the theory offers little by way of an explanation of the practical features of slurs. (Croom 2011) Pointing out that slurs are prohibited words does not help us understand how they are such effective vehicles for spreading prejudice. Additionally, Whiting (2013) observes that it is possible for there to be slurs in the absence of taboos or social prohibitions. In a society in which the vast majority of speakers are prejudiced toward a particular racial group, and the targeted group members have internalized racist attitudes, it may be that no one objects to the use of slurs or finds them offensive, yet slurs might still be derogatory. Thus, social prohibitions cannot be all there is to the derogatoriness of slurs.

Finally, by defining slurs as merely prohibited words, Anderson and Lepore rule out a priori the possibility of slurs that are appropriate and morally permissible. One example might be ‘fascist’, which targets individuals based on political affiliation; using this slur to denigrate an authoritarian dictator need not (and perhaps should not) be prohibited.

4. Broader Applications

Since the 1980s, philosophical work on pejoratives has focused primarily on two questions: what (if anything) do pejoratives mean, and how is derogation by means of pejoratives accomplished? Researchers working on these questions would do well to familiarize themselves with empirical literature on pejoratives (for empirical studies on the behavioral and psychological effects of overhearing slurs, see Kirkland and others. 1987, Carnaghi and Maass 2007, and Gadon and Johnson 2009).

Work on slurs in the philosophy of language and linguistics has implications for debates in other disciplines. For instance, in answering the question of whether there should be legal restrictions on hate speech (which may involve the use of slurs), we will need to get clear on how hate speech harms its targets (Hornsby 2001). Legal theorists interested in these issues will want to pay careful attention to the literature discussed in this article. (For a discussion of whether laws against hate speech are justified, see Waldron 2012.)

5. References and Further Reading

Anderson, L. and E. Lepore 2013a, “Slurring Words,” Nous 47.1, 25-48
- [Offers a deflationary theory of slurs]
Anderson, L. and E. Lepore 2013b, “What Did you Call Me? Slurs as Prohibited Words: Setting Things Up,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 350-363.
- [Responds to objections to the deflationary theory defended in their 2013a]
Ayer, A. J. 1936, Language, Truth and Logic, Dover, New York.
- [Defends an expressivist theory of moral and aesthetic terms]
Bach, K. 1994, “Conversational Impliciture,” Mind and Language 9.2, 124-162.
- [Argues that Grice’s distinction between what a speaker literally says and what she implies is not exhaustive, and posits a third, intermediate category]
Bach, K. 1999, “The Myth of Conventional Implicature,” Linguistics and Philosophy 22.4, 327-366.
- [Argues that what is commonly held to be conventionally implicated content is actually part of what is said]
Brandom, R. 2000, Articulating Reasons: An Introduction to Inferentialism, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Brontsema, R. 2004, “A Queer Revolution: Reconceptualizing the Debate over Linguistic Reclamation,” Colorado Research in Linguistics 17.1, 1-17.
- [Gives an overview of the notion of linguistic appropriation as it applies to slurs]
Camp, E. 2013, “Slurring Perspectives,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 330-349.
- [Defends a perspectival theory of slurs]
Carnaghi, A. and A. Maass 2007, “In-Group and Out-Group Perspectives in the Use of Derogatory Group Labels: Gay versus Fag,” Journal of Language and Social Psychology 26.2, 142-156.
- [A study that measures the effects of slurs on targeted individuals compared with non-targets]
Croom, A.M. 2011, “Slurs,” Language Sciences 33, 343-358.
- [Offers a stereotype theory of slurs]
Dummett, M. 1981, Frege: Philosophy of Language 2^nd ed., Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Frege, G. 1892, “On Sinn and Bedeutung,” in M. Beany (ed.) 1997, The Frege Reader Blackwell, Malden, MA, 151-171.
- [A classic paper in which Frege defends his theory of sense and reference]
Frege, G. 1897, “Logic,” in M. Beany (ed.) The Frege Reader, Blackwell, Malden, MA, 227-250.
- [Frege explicates his notion of “coloring”]
Gadon, O. and C. Johnson 2009, “The Effect of a Derogatory Professional Label: Evaluations of a “Shrink”,” Journal of Applied Social Psychology 39.3, 634-55.
- [Empirical study on the effects of overhearing a psychologist referred to as a ‘shrink’]
Geach, P. 1965, “Assertion,” Philosophical Review 69, 449-465.
- [Poses the famous Frege-Geach problem]
Gibbard, A. 2003, “Reasons Thick and Thin: A Possibility Proof,’ Journal of Philosophy 100.6, 288-304.
- [Argues that slurs are like thick evaluative terms in that they express both descriptive and evaluative content]
Grice, P. 1989, Studies in the Way of Words, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [A collection of papers on various topics in the philosophy of language]
Hom, C. 2008, “The Semantics of Racial Epithets,” Journal of Philosophy 105, 416-440.
- [Defends a truth-conditional, semantic theory of slurs]
Hom, C. 2010, “Pejoratives,” Philosophy Compass 5.2, 164-185.
- [Gives a general overview of various theories of pejoratives]
Hom, C. 2012, “A Puzzle about Pejoratives,” Philosophical Studies 159.3, 383-405.
- [Extends the semantic theory of slurs developed in his (2008) to swear words]
Hornsby, J. 2001, “Meaning and Uselessness: How to Think About Derogatory Words,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 25, 128-141.
- [Defends a gestural theory of slurs]
Jeshion, R. 2013, “Slurs and Stereotypes,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 314-329.
- [Raises objections to the theories of slurs developed by Hom (2008) and Camp (2013)]
Kaplan, D. 2004, “The Meaning of Ouch and Oops” (unpublished transcription of the Howison Lecture in Philosophy at U.C. Berkeley)
- [Defends a broadly expressivist theory of pejoratives]
Kirkland, S., J. Greenberg, and T. Pyszczynski 1987, “Further Evidence of the Deleterious Effects of Overheard Ethnic Labels: Derogation Beyond the Target,” Personality and Social Psychology Bulletin 13.2, 216-227.
- [Empirical study on how overhearing the slur ‘nigger’ affects evaluations of those targeted by the slur]
Kripke, S. 1980, Naming and Necessity, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Gives a defense of semantic externalism]
Lewis, D. 1979, “Scorekeeping in a Language Game,” Journal of Philosophical Logic 8, 339-359.
- [Offers a theory of conversational kinematics]
Neale, S. 1999, “Colouring and Composition,” in R. Stainton and K. Murasugi (eds.) Philosophy and Linguistics, Westview press, Boulder, CO, 35-82.
- [Explicates Frege’s notion of coloring]
Potts, C. 2007, “The Expressive Dimension,” Theoretical Linguistics 33.2, 255-268.
- [Offers a non-propositional version of the conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Putnam, H. 1975, “The Meaning of Meaning,” in Mind, Language and Reality: Philosophical Papers Volume 2, C.U.P., Cambridge: Cambridge, 215-271.
- [Offers a defense of semantic externalism]
Richard, M. 2008, When Truth Gives Out, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Argues that utterances containing derogatory uses of slurs are not truth-apt]
Saka, P. 1998, “Quotation and the Use-Mention Distinction” Mind 107, 113-136.
- [Notes that quotation does not entirely eliminate the offensiveness of swear words]
Saka, P. 2007, How to Think About Meaning, Springer, Berlin.
- [Defends a hybrid expressivist theory of slurs]
Schlenker, P. 2007, “Expressive Presuppositions,” Theoretical Linguistics 33.2, 237-245.
- [Defends a presupposition theory of pejoratives]
Soames, S. 1989, “Presupposition,” in M. Gabbay and F. Guenthner (eds.) Handbook of Philosophical Logic, Kulwer, Dordrecht, 553-616.
- [Explicates the notion of linguistic presupposition]
Stenner, A.J. 1981, “A Note on Logical Truth and Non-Sexist Semantics,” in M. Vetterling-Braggin (ed.) Sexist Language: A Modern Philosophical Analysis, Littlefield, Adams and Co, New York, 299-306.
- [Defends a conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Tirrell, L. 1999, “Derogatory Terms,” in C. Hendriks and K. Oliver (eds.) Language and Liberation: Feminism, Philosophy and Language, SUNY Press, Albany, NY, 41-79.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Waldron, J. 2012, The Harm in Hate Speech, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Makes the case for legal restrictions on hate speech]
Whiting, D. 2007, “Inferentialism, Representationalism and Derogatory Words,” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 15.2, 191-205.
- [Offers a conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Whiting, D. 2013, “It’s Not What You Said, It’s the Way You Said It: Slurs and Conventional Implicature,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 364-377.
- [Responds to objections to the conventional implicature theory by Hom (2008) and others]
Williams, B. 1985, Ethics and the Limits of Philosophy, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Explicates the notion of a thick evaluative term]
Williamson, T. 2009, “Reference, Inference and the Semantics of Pejoratives,” in J. Almog and P. Leonardi (eds.) The Philosophy of David Kaplan, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 137-158.
- [Raises objections to the inferentialist theory of slurs; defends a conventional implicature theory.]

Author Information

Ralph DiFranco
Email: ralph.difranco@uconn.edu
University of Connecticut
U. S. A.

Continental Rationalism

Continental rationalism is a retrospective category used to group together certain philosophers working in continental Europe in the 17^th and 18^th centuries, in particular, Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, especially as they can be regarded in contrast with representatives of “British empiricism,” most notably, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. Whereas the British empiricists held that all knowledge has its origin in, and is limited by, experience, the Continental rationalists thought that knowledge has its foundation in the scrutiny and orderly deployment of ideas and principles proper to the mind itself. The rationalists did not spurn experience as is sometimes mistakenly alleged; they were thoroughly immersed in the rapid developments of the new science, and in some cases led those developments. They held, however, that experience alone, while useful in practical matters, provides an inadequate foundation for genuine knowledge.

The fact that “Continental rationalism” and “British empiricism” are retrospectively applied terms does not mean that the distinction that they signify is anachronistic. Leibniz’s New Essays on Human Understanding, for instance, outlines stark contrasts between his own way of thinking and that of Locke, which track many features of the rationalist/empiricist distinction as it tends to be applied in retrospect. There was no rationalist creed or manifesto to which Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz all subscribed (nor, for that matter, was there an empiricist one). Nevertheless, with due caution, it is possible to use the “Continental rationalism” category (and its empiricist counterpart) to highlight significant points of convergence in the philosophies of Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, inter alia. These include: (1) a doctrine of innate ideas; (2) the application of mathematical method to philosophy; and (3) the use of a priori principles in the construction of substance-based metaphysical systems.

Origin and History of the Term “Rationalism”
Innate Ideas
1. Descartes
2. Spinoza
3. Leibniz
4. Malebranche
Mathematical Method
A Priori Principles
1. Intelligibility and the Cartesian Circle
2. Substance Metaphysics
Continental Rationalism, Experience, and Experiment
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Origin and History of the Term “Rationalism”

According to the Historisches Worterbuch der Philosophie, the word “rationaliste” appears in 16^th century France, as early as 1539, in opposition to “empirique.” In his New Organon, first published in 1620 (in Latin), Francis Bacon juxtaposes rationalism and empiricism in memorable terms:

Those who have treated of the sciences have been either empiricists [Empirici] or dogmatists [Dogmatici]. Empiricists [Empirici], like ants, simply accumulate and use; Rationalists [Rationales], like spiders, spin webs from themselves; the way of the bee is in between: it takes material from the flowers of the garden and the field; but it has the ability to convert and digest them. (The New Organon, p. 79; Spedding, 1, 201)

Bacon’s association of rationalists with dogmatists in this passage foreshadows Kant’s use of the term “dogmatisch” in reference, especially, to the Wolffian brand of rationalist philosophy prevalent in 18^th century Germany. Nevertheless, Bacon’s use of “rationales” does not refer to “Continental rationalism,” which developed only after the New Organon, but rather to the Scholastic philosophy that dominated the medieval period. Moreover, while Bacon is, in retrospect, often considered the father of modern empiricism, the above-quoted passage shows him no friendlier to the empirici than to the rationales. Thus, Bacon’s juxtaposition of rationalism and empiricism should not be confused with the distinction as it develops over the course of the 17^th and 18^th centuries, although his imagery is certainly suggestive.

The distinction appears in an influential form as the backdrop to Kant’s critical philosophy (which is often loosely understood as a kind of synthesis of certain aspects of Continental rationalism and British empiricism) at the end of the 18^th century. However, it was not until the time of Hegel in the first half of the 19^th century that the terms “rationalism” and “empiricism” were applied to separating the figures of the 17^th and 18^th centuries into contrasting epistemological camps in the fashion with which we are familiar today. In his Lectures on the History of Philosophy, Hegel describes an opposition between “a priori thought,” on the one hand, according to which “the determinations which should be valid for thought should be taken from thought itself,” and, on the other hand, “the determination that we must begin and end and think, etc., from experience.” He describes this as the opposition between “Rationalismus” and “Empirismus” (Werke 20, 121).

2. Innate Ideas

Perhaps the best recognized and most commonly made distinction between rationalists and empiricists concerns the question of the source of ideas. Whereas rationalists tend to think (with some exceptions discussed below) that some ideas, at least, such as the idea of God, are innate, empiricists hold that all ideas come from experience. Although the rationalists tend to be remembered for their positive doctrine concerning innate ideas, their assertions are matched by a rejection of the notion that all ideas can be accounted for on the basis of experience alone. In some Continental rationalists, especially in Spinoza, the negative doctrine is more apparent than the positive. The distinction is worth bearing in mind, in order to avoid the very false impression that the rationalists held to innate ideas because the empiricist alternative had not come along yet. (In general, the British empiricists came after the rationalists.) The Aristotelian doctrine, nihil in intellectu nisi prius in sensu (nothing in the intellect unless first in the senses), had been dominant for centuries, and it was in reaction against this that the rationalists revived in modified form the contrasting Platonic doctrine of innate ideas.

a. Descartes

Descartes distinguishes between three kinds of ideas: adventitious (adventitiae), factitious (factae), and innate (innatae). As an example of an adventitious idea, Descartes gives the common idea of the sun (yellow, bright, round) as it is perceived through the senses. As an example of a factitious idea, Descartes cites the idea of the sun constructed via astronomical reasoning (vast, gaseous body). According to Descartes, all ideas which represent “true, immutable, and eternal essences” are innate. Innate ideas, for Descartes, include the idea of God, the mind, and mathematical truths, such as the fact that it pertains to the nature of a triangle that its three angles equal two right angles.

By conceiving some ideas as innate, Descartes does not mean that children are born with fully actualized conceptions of, for example, triangles and their properties. This is a common misconception of the rationalist doctrine of innate ideas. Descartes strives to correct it in Comments on a Certain Broadsheet, where he compares the innateness of ideas in the mind to the tendency which some babies are born with to contract certain diseases: “it is not so much that the babies of such families suffer from these diseases in their mother’s womb, but simply that they are born with a certain ‘faculty’ or tendency to contract them” (CSM I, 304). In other words, innate ideas exist in the mind potentially, as tendencies; they are then actualized by means of active thought under certain circumstances, such as seeing a triangular figure.

At various points, Descartes defends his doctrine of innate ideas against philosophers (Hobbes, Gassendi, and Regius, inter alia) who hold that all ideas enter the mind through the senses, and that there are no ideas apart from images. Descartes is relatively consistent on his reasons for thinking that some ideas, at least, must be innate. His principal line of argument proceeds by showing that there are certain ideas, for example, the idea of a triangle, that cannot be either adventitious or factitious; since ideas are either adventitious, factitious, or innate, by process of elimination, such ideas must be innate.

Take Descartes’ favorite example of the idea of a triangle. The argument that the idea of a triangle cannot be adventitious proceeds roughly as follows. A triangle is composed of straight lines. However, straight lines never enter our mind via the senses, since when we examine straight lines under a magnifying lens, they turn out to be wavy or irregular in some way. Since we cannot derive the idea of straight lines from the senses, we cannot derive the idea of a true triangle, which is made up of straight lines, through the senses. Sometimes Descartes makes the point in slightly different terms by insisting that there is “no similarity” between the corporeal motions of the sense organs and the ideas formed in the mind on the occasion of those motions (CSM I, 304; CSMK III, 187). One such dissimilarity, which is particularly striking, is the contrast between the particularity of all corporeal motions and the universality that pure ideas can attain when conjoined to form necessary truths. Descartes makes this point in clear terms to Regius:

I would like our author to tell me what the corporeal motion is that is capable of forming some common notion to the effect that ‘things which are equal to a third thing are equal to each other,’ or any other he cares to take. For all such motions are particular, whereas the common notions are universal and bear no affinity with, or relation to, the motions. (CSM I, 304-5)

Next, Descartes has to show that the idea of a triangle is not factitious. This is where the doctrine of “true and immutable natures” comes in. For Descartes, if, for example, the idea that the three angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles were his own invention, it would be mutable, like the idea of a gold mountain, which can be changed at whim into the idea of a silver mountain. Instead, when Descartes thinks about his idea of a triangle, he is able to discover eternal properties of it that are not mutable in this way; hence, they are not invented (CSMK III, 184).

Since, therefore, the triangle can be neither adventitious nor factitious, it must be innate; that is to say, the mind has an innate tendency or power to form this idea from its own purely intellectual resources when prompted to do so.

Descartes’ insistence that there is no similarity between the corporeal motions of our sense organs and the ideas formed in the mind on the occasion of those motions raises a difficulty for understanding how any ideas could be adventitious. Since none of our ideas have any similarity to the corporeal motions of the sense organs – even the idea of motion itself – it seems that no ideas can in fact have their origin in a source external to the mind. The reason that we have an idea of heat in the presence of fire, for instance, is not, then, because the idea is somehow transmitted by the fire. Rather, Descartes thinks that God designed us in such a way that we form the idea of heat on the occasion of certain corporeal motions in our sense organs (and we form other sensory ideas on the occasion of other corporeal motions). Thus, there is a sense in which, for Descartes, all ideas are innate, and his tripartite division between kinds of ideas becomes difficult to maintain.

b. Spinoza

Per his so-called doctrine of “parallelism,” Spinoza conceives the mind and the body as one and the same thing, conceived under different attributes (to wit, thought and extension). (See Benedict de Spinoza: Metaphysics.) As a result, Spinoza denies that there is any causal interaction between mind and body, and so Spinoza denies that any ideas are caused by bodily change. Just as bodies can be affected only by other bodies, so ideas can be affected only by other ideas. This does not mean, however, that all ideas are innate for Spinoza, as they very clearly are for Leibniz (see below). Just as the body can be conceived to be affected by external objects conceived under the attribute of extension (that is, as bodies), so the mind can (as it were, in parallel) be conceived to be affected by the same objects conceived under the attribute of thought (that is, as ideas). Ideas gained in this way, from encounters with external objects (conceived as ideas) constitutes knowledge of the first kind, or “imagination,” for Spinoza, and all such ideas are “inadequate,” or in other words, confused and lacking order for the intellect. “Adequate ideas,” on the other hand, which can be formed via Spinoza’s second and third kinds of knowledge (reason and intuitive knowledge, respectively), and which are clear and distinct and have order for the intellect, are not gained through chance encounters with external objects; rather, adequate ideas can be explained in terms of resources intrinsic to the mind. (For more on Spinoza’s three kinds of knowledge and the distinction between adequate and inadequate ideas, see Benedict de Spinoza: Epistemology.)

The mind, for Spinoza, just by virtue of having ideas, which is its essence, has ideas of what Spinoza calls “common notions,” or in other words, those things which are “equally in the part and in the whole.” Examples of common notions include motion and rest, extension, and indeed God. Take extension for example. To think of any body – however small or however large – is to have a perfectly complete idea of extension. So, insofar as the mind has any idea of body (and, for Spinoza, the human mind is the idea of the human body, and so always has ideas of body), it has a perfectly adequate idea of extension. The same can be said for motion and rest. The same can also be said for God, except that God is not equally in the part and in the whole of extension only, but of all things. Spinoza treats these common notions as principles of reasoning. Anything that can be deduced on their basis is also adequate.

It is not clear if Spinoza’s common notions should be considered innate ideas. Spinoza speaks of active and passive ideas, and adequate and inadequate ideas. He associates the former with the intellect and the latter with the imagination, but “innate idea” is not an explicit category in Spinoza’s theory of ideas as it is in Descartes’ and also Leibniz’s. Common notions are not “in” the mind independent of the mind’s relation with its object (the body); nevertheless, since it is the mind’s nature to be the idea of the body, it is part of the mind’s nature to have common notions. Commentators differ over the question of whether Spinoza had a positive doctrine of innate ideas; it is clear, however, that he denied that all ideas come about through encounters with external objects; moreover, he believed that those ideas which do come about through encounters with external objects are of an inferior epistemic value than those produced through the mind’s own intrinsic resources; this is enough to put him in the rationalist camp on the question of the origin of ideas.

c. Leibniz

Of the three great rationalists, Leibniz propounded the most thoroughgoing doctrine of innate ideas. For Leibniz, all ideas are strictly speaking innate. In a general and relatively straightforward sense, this viewpoint is a direct consequence of Leibniz’s conception of individual substance. According to Leibniz, “each substance is a world apart, independent of everything outside of itself except for God. Thus all our phenomena, that is to say, all the things that can ever happen to us, are only the results of our own being” (L, 312); or, in Leibniz’s famous phrase from the Monadology, “monads have no windows,” meaning there is no way for sensory data to enter monads from the outside. In this more general sense, then, to give an explanation for Leibniz’s doctrine of innate ideas would be to explain his conception of individual substance and the arguments and considerations which motivate it. (See Section 4, b, iii, below for a discussion of Leibniz’s conception of substance; see also Gottfried Leibniz: Metaphysics.) This would be to circumvent the issues and questions which are typically at the heart of the debate over the existence of innate ideas, which concern the extent to which certain kinds of perceptions, ideas, and propositions can be accounted for on the basis of experience. Although Leibniz’s more general reasons for embracing innate ideas stem from his unique brand of substance metaphysics, Leibniz does enter into the debate over innate ideas, as it were, addressing the more specific questions regarding the source of given kinds of ideas, most notably in his dialogic engagement with Locke’s philosophy, New Essays on Human Understanding.

Due to Leibniz’s conception of individual substance, nothing actually comes from a sensory experience, where a sensory experience is understood to involve direct concourse with things outside of the mind. However, Leibniz does have a means for distinguishing between sensations and purely intellectual thoughts within the framework of his substance metaphysics. For Leibniz, although each monad or individual substance “expresses” (or represents) the entire universe from its own unique point of view, it does so with a greater or lesser degree of clarity and distinctness. Bare monads, such as comprise minerals and vegetation, express the rest of the world only in the most confused fashion. Rational minds, by contrast, have a much greater proportion of clear and distinct perceptions, and so express more of the world clearly and distinctly than do bare monads. When an individual substance attains a more perfect expression of the world (in the sense that it attains a less confused expression of the world), it is said to act; when its expression becomes more confused, it is said to be acted upon. Using this distinction, Leibniz is able to reconcile the terms of his philosophy with everyday conceptions. Although, strictly speaking, no monad is acted upon by any other, nor acts upon any other directly, it is possible to speak this way, just as, Leibniz says, Copernicans can still speak of the motion of the sun for everyday purposes, while understanding that the sun does not in fact move. It is in this sense that Leibniz enters into the debate concerning the origin of our ideas.

Leibniz distinguishes between “ideas” (idées) and “thoughts” (pensées) (or, sometimes, “notions” (notions) or “concepts” (conceptus)). Ideas exist in the soul whether we actually perceive them or are aware of them or not. It is these “ideas” that Leibniz contends are innate. “Thoughts,” by contrast is Leibniz’s designation for ideas which we actually form or conceive at any given time. In this sense, “thoughts” can be formed on the basis of a sensory experience (with the above caveats regarding the meaning a sensory experience can have in Leibniz’s thought) or on the basis of an internal experience, or a reflection. Leibniz alternatively characterizes our “ideas” as “aptitudes,” “preformations,” and as “dispositions” to represent something when the occasion for thinking of it arises. On multiple occasions, Leibniz uses the metaphor of the veins present in marble to illustrate his understanding of innate ideas. Just as the veins dispose the sculptor to shape the marble in certain ways, so do our ideas dispose us to have certain thoughts on the occasion of certain experiences.

Leibniz rejects the view that the mind cannot have ideas without being aware that it has them. (See Gottfried Leibniz: Philosophy of Mind.) Much of the disagreement between Locke and Leibniz on the question of innate ideas turns on this point, since Locke (at least as Leibniz represents him in the New Essays) is not able to make any sense out of the notion that the mind can have ideas without being aware of them. Much of Leibniz’s defense of his innate ideas doctrine takes the form of replying to Locke’s charge that it is absurd to hold that the mind could think (that is, have ideas) without being aware of it.

Leibniz marshals several considerations in support of his view that the mind is not always aware of its ideas. The fact that we can store many more ideas in our understanding than we can be aware of at any given time is one. Leibniz also points to the phenomenology of attention; we do not attend to everything in our perceptual field at any given time; rather we focus on certain things at the expense of others. To convey a sense of what it might be like for the mind to have perceptions and ideas in a dreamless sleep, Leibniz asks the reader to imagine subtracting our attention from perceptual experience; since we can distinguish between what is attended to and what is not, subtracting attention does not eliminate perception altogether.

While such considerations suggest the possibility of innate ideas, they do not in and of themselves prove that innate ideas are necessary to explain the full scope of human cognition. The empiricist tends to think that if innate ideas are not necessary to explain cognition, then they should be abandoned as gratuitous metaphysical constructs. Leibniz does have arguments designed to show that innate ideas are needed for a full account of human cognition.

In the first place, Leibniz recalls favorably the famous scenario from Plato’s Meno where Socrates teaches a slave boy to grasp abstract mathematical truths merely by asking questions. The anecdote is supposed to indicate that mathematical truths can be generated by the mind alone, in the absence of particular sensory experiences, if only the mind is prompted to discover what it contains within itself. Concerning mathematics and geometry, Leibniz remarks: “one could construct these sciences in one’s study and even with one’s eyes closed, without learning from sight or even from touch any of the needed truths” (NE, 77). So, on these grounds, Leibniz contends that without innate ideas, we could not explain the sorts of cognitive capacities exhibited in the mathematical sciences.

A second argument concerns our capacity to grasp certain necessary or eternal truths. Leibniz says that necessary truths can be suggested, justified, and confirmed by experience, but that they can be proved only by the understanding alone (NE, 80). Leibniz does not explain this point further, but he seems to have in mind the point later made by both Hume and Kant (to different ends), that experience on its own can never account for the kind of certainty that we find in mathematical and metaphysical truths. For Leibniz, if it can be granted that we can be certain of propositions in mathematics and metaphysics – and Leibniz thinks this must be granted – recourse must be had to principles innate to the mind in order to explain our ability to be certain of such things.

d. Malebranche

It is worth noting briefly the position of Nicolas Malebranche on innate ideas, since Malebranche is often considered among the rationalists, yet he denied the doctrine of innate ideas. Malebranche’s reasons for rejecting innate ideas were anything but empiricist in nature, however. His leading objection stems from the infinity of ideas that the mind is able to form independently of the senses; as an example, Malebranche cites the infinite number of triangles of which the mind could in principle, albeit not in practice, form ideas. Unlike Descartes and Leibniz, who view innate ideas as tendencies or dispositions to form certain thoughts under certain circumstances, Malebranche understands them as fully formed entities that would have to exist somehow in the mind were they to exist there innately. Given this conception, Malebranche finds it unlikely that God would have created “so many things along with the mind of man” (The Search After Truth, p. 227). Since God already contains the ideas of all things within Himself, Malebranche thinks that it would be much more economical if God were simply to reveal to us the ideas of things that already exist in him rather than placing an infinity of ideas in each human mind. Malebranche’s tenet that “we see all things in God” thus follows upon the principle that God always acts in the simplest ways. Malebranche finds further support for this doctrine from the fact that it places human minds in a position of complete dependence on God. Thus, if Malebranche’s rejection of innate ideas distinguishes him from other rationalists, it does so not from an empiricist standpoint, but rather because of the extent to which his position on ideas is theologically motivated.

3. Mathematical Method

In one sense, what it means to be a rationalist is to model philosophy on mathematics, and, in particular, geometry. This means that the rationalist begins with definitions and intuitively self-evident axioms and proceeds thence to deduce a philosophical system of knowledge that is both certain and complete. This at least is the goal and (with some qualifications to be explored below) the claim. In no work of rationalist philosophy is this procedure more apparent than in Spinoza’s Ethics, laid out famously in the geometrical manner (more geometrico). Nevertheless, Descartes’ main works (and those of Leibniz as well), although not as overtly more geometrico as Spinoza’s Ethics, are also modelled after geometry, and it is Descartes’ celebrated methodological program that first introduces mathematics as a model for philosophy.

a. Descartes

Perhaps Descartes’ clearest and most well-known statement of mathematics’ role as paradigm appears in the Discourse on the Method:

Those long chains of very simple and easy reasonings, which geometers customarily use to arrive at their most difficult demonstrations, had given me occasion to suppose that all the things which can fall under human knowledge are interconnected in the same way. (CSM I, 120)

However, Descartes’ promotion of mathematics as a model for philosophy dates back to his early, unfinished work, Rules for the Direction of the Mind. It is in this work that Descartes first outlines his standards for certainty that have since come to be so closely associated with him and with the rationalist enterprise more generally.

In Rule 2, Descartes declares that henceforth only what is certain should be valued and counted as knowledge. This means the rejection of all merely probable reasoning, which Descartes associates with the philosophy of the Schools. Descartes admits that according to this criterion, only arithmetic and geometry thus far count as knowledge. But Descartes does not conclude that only in these disciplines is it possible to attain knowledge. According to Descartes, the reason that certainty has eluded philosophers has as much to do with the disdain that philosophers have for the simplest truths as it does with the subject matter. Admittedly, the objects of arithmetic and geometry are especially pure and simple, or, as Descartes will later say, “clear and distinct.” Nevertheless, certainty can be attained in philosophy as well, provided the right method is followed.

Descartes distinguishes between two ways of achieving knowledge: “through experience and through deduction […] [W]e must note that while our experiences of things are often deceptive, the deduction or pure inference of one thing from another can never be performed wrongly by an intellect which is in the least degree rational […]” (CSM I, 12). This is a clear statement of Descartes’ methodological rationalism. Building up knowledge through accumulated experience can only ever lead to the sort of probable knowledge that Descartes finds lacking. “Pure inference,” by contrast,” can never go astray, at least when it is conducted by right reason. Of course, the truth value of a deductive chain is only as good as the first truths, or axioms, whose truth the deductions preserve. It is for this reason that Descartes’ method relies on intuition as well as deduction. Intuition provides the first principles of a deductive system, for Descartes. Intuition differs from deduction insofar as it is not discursive. Intuition grasps its object in an immediate way. In its broadest outlines, Descartes’ method is just the use of intuition and deduction in the orderly attainment and preservation of certainty.

In subsequent Rules, Descartes goes on to elaborate a more specific methodological program, which involves reducing complicated matters step by step to simpler, intuitively graspable truths, and then using those simple truths as principles from which to deduce knowledge of more complicated matters. It is generally accepted by scholars that this more specific methodological program reappears in a more iconic form in the Discourse on the Method as the four rules for gaining knowledge outlined in Part 2. There is some doubt as to the extent to which this more specific methodological program actually plays any role in Descartes’ mature philosophy as it is expressed in the Meditations and Principles (see Garber 2001, chapter 2). There can be no doubt, however, that the broader methodological guidelines outlined above were a permanent feature of Descartes’ thought.

In response to a request to cast his Meditations in the geometrical style (that is, in the style of Euclid’s Elements), Descartes distinguishes between two aspects of the geometrical style: order and method, explaining:

The order consists simply in this. The items which are put forward first must be known entirely without the aid of what comes later; and the remaining items must be arranged in such a way that their demonstration depends solely on what has gone before. I did try to follow this order very carefully in my Meditations […] (CSM II, 110)

Elsewhere, Descartes contrasts this order, which he calls the “order of reasons,” with another order, which he associates with scholasticism, and which he calls the “order of subject-matter” (see CSMK III, 163). What Descartes understands as “geometrical order” or the “order of reasons” is just the procedure of starting with what is most simple, and proceeding in a step-wise, deliberate fashion to deduce consequences from there. Descartes’ order is governed by what can be clearly and distinctly intuited, and by what can be clearly and distinctly inferred from such self-evident intuitions (rather than by a concern for organizing the discussion into neat topical categories per the order of subject-matter)

As for method, Descartes distinguishes between analysis and synthesis. For Descartes, analysis and synthesis represent different methods of demonstrating a conclusion or set of conclusions. Analysis exhibits the path by which the conclusion comes to be grasped. As such, it can be thought of as the order of discovery or order of knowledge. Synthesis, by contrast, wherein conclusions are deduced from a series of definitions, postulates, and axioms, as in Euclid’s Elements, for instance, follows not the order in which things are discovered, but rather the order that things bear to one another in reality. As such, it can be thought of as the order of being. God, for example, is prior to the human mind in the order of being (since God created the human mind), and so in the synthetic mode of demonstration the existence of God is demonstrated before the existence of the human mind. However, knowledge of one’s own mind precedes knowledge of God, at least in Descartes’ philosophy, and so in the analytic mode of demonstration the cogito is demonstrated before the existence of God. Descartes’ preference is for analysis, because he thinks that it is superior in helping the reader to discover the things for herself, and so in bringing about the intellectual conversion which it is the Meditations’ goal to effectuate in the minds of its readers. According to Descartes, while synthesis, in laying out demonstrations systematically, is useful in preempting dissent, it is inferior in engaging the mind of the reader.

Two primary distinctions can be made in summarizing Descartes’ methodology: (1) the distinction between the order of reasons and the order of subject-matter; and (2) the analysis/synthesis distinction. With respect to the first distinction, the great Continental rationalists are united. All adhere to the order of reasons, as we have described it above, rather than the order of subject-matter. Even though the rationalists disagree about how exactly to interpret the content of the order of reasons, their common commitment to following an order of reasons is a hallmark of their rationalism. Although there are points of convergence with respect to the second, analysis/synthesis distinction, there are also clear points of divergence, and this distinction can be useful in highlighting the range of approaches the rationalists adopt to mathematical methodology.

b. Spinoza

Of the great Continental rationalists, Spinoza is the most closely associated with mathematical method due to the striking presentation of his magnum opus, the Ethics, (as well as his presentation of Descartes’ Principles), in geometrical fashion. The fact that Spinoza is the only major rationalist to present his main work more geometrico might create the impression that he is the only philosopher to employ mathematical method in constructing and elaborating his philosophical system. This impression is mistaken, since both Descartes and Leibniz also apply mathematical method to philosophy. Nevertheless, there are differences between Spinoza’s employment of mathematical method and that of Descartes (and Leibniz). The most striking, of course, is the form of Spinoza’s Ethics. Each part begins with a series of definitions, axioms, and postulates and proceeds thence to deduce propositions, the demonstrations of which refer back to the definitions, axioms, postulates and previously demonstrated propositions on which they depend. Of course, this is just the method of presenting findings that Descartes in the Second Replies dubbed “synthesis.” For Descartes, analysis and synthesis differ only in pedagogical respects: whereas analysis is better for helping the reader discover the truth for herself, synthesis is better in compelling agreement.

There is some evidence that Spinoza’s motivations for employing synthesis were in part pedagogical. In Lodewijk Meyer’s preface to Spinoza’s Principles of Cartesian Philosophy, Meyer uses Descartes’ Second Replies distinction between analysis and synthesis to explain the motivation for the work. Meyer criticizes Descartes’ followers for being too uncritical in their enthusiasm for Descartes’ thought, and attributes this in part to the relative opacity of Descartes’ analytic mode of presentation. Thus, for Meyer, the motivation for presenting Descartes’ Principles in the synthetic manner is to make the proofs more transparent, and thereby leave less excuse for blind acceptance of Descartes’ conclusions. It is not clear to what extent Meyer’s explanation of the mode of presentation of Spinoza’s Principles of Cartesian Philosophy applies to Spinoza’s Ethics. In the first place, although Spinoza approved the preface, he did not author it himself. Secondly, while such an explanation seems especially suited to a work in which Spinoza’s chief goal was to present another philosopher’s thought in a different form, there is no reason to assume that it applies to the presentation of Spinoza’s own philosophy. Scholars have differed on how to interpret the geometrical form of Spinoza’s Ethics. However, it is generally accepted that Spinoza’s use of synthesis does not merely represent a pedagogical preference. There is reason to think that Spinoza’s methodology differs from that of Descartes in a somewhat deeper way.

There is another version of the analysis/synthesis distinction besides Descartes’ that was also influential in the 17^th century, that is, Hobbes’ version of the distinction. Although there is little direct evidence that Spinoza was influenced by Hobbes’ version of the distinction, some scholars have claimed a connection, and, in any case, it is useful to view Spinoza’s methodology in light of the Hobbesian alternative.

Synthesis and analysis are not modes of demonstrating findings that have already been made, for Hobbes, as they are for Descartes, but rather complementary means of generating findings; in particular, they are forms of causal reasoning. For Hobbes, analysis is reasoning from effects to causes; synthesis is reasoning in the other direction, from causes to effects. For example, by analysis, we infer that geometrical objects are constructed via the motions of points and lines and surfaces. Once motion has been established as the principle of geometry, it is then possible, via synthesis, to construct the possible effects of motion, and thereby, to make new discoveries in geometry. According to the Hobbesian schema, then, synthesis is not merely a mode of presenting truths, but a means of generating and discovering truths. (For Hobbes’ method, see The English Works of Thomas Hobbes of Malmesbury, vol. 1, ch. 6.) There is reason to think that synthesis had this kind of significance for Spinoza, as well – as a means of discovery, not merely presentation. Spinoza’s methodology, and, in particular, his theory of definitions, bear this out

Spinoza’s method begins with reflection on the nature of a “given true idea.” The “given true idea” serves as a standard by which the mind learns the distinction between true and false ideas, and also between the intellect and the imagination, and how to direct itself properly in the discovery of true ideas. The correct formulation of definitions emerges as the most important factor in directing the mind properly in the discovery of true ideas. To illustrate his conception of a good definition, Spinoza contrasts two definitions of a circle. On one definition, a circle is a figure in which all the lines from the center to the circumference are equal. On another, a circle is the figure described by the rotation of a line around one of its ends, which is fixed. For Spinoza, the second definition is superior. Whereas the first definition gives only a property of the circle, the second provides the cause from which all of the properties can be deduced. Hence, what makes a definition a good definition, for Spinoza, is its capacity to serve as a basis for the discovery of truths about the thing. The circle, of course, is just an example. For Spinoza, the method is perfected when it arrives at a true idea of the first cause of all things, that is, God. Only the method is perfected with a true idea of God, however, not the philosophy. The philosophy itself begins with a true idea of God, since the philosophy consists in deducing the consequences from a true idea of God. With this in mind, the definition of God is of paramount importance. In correspondence, Spinoza compares contrasting definitions of God, explaining that he chose the one which expresses the efficient cause from which all of the properties of God can be deduced.

In this light, it becomes clear that the geometrical presentation of Spinoza’s philosophy is not merely a pedagogic preference. The definitions that appear at the outset of the five parts of the Ethics do not serve merely to make explicit what might otherwise have remained only implicit in Descartes’ analytic mode of presentation. Rather, key definitions, such as the definition of God, are principles that underwrite the development of the system. As a result, Hobbes’ conception of the analysis/synthesis distinction throws an important light on Spinoza’s procedure. There is a movement of analysis in arriving at the causal definition of God from the preliminary “given true idea.” Then there is a movement of synthesis in deducing consequences from that causal definition. Of course, Descartes’ analysis/synthesis distinction still applies, since, after all, Spinoza’s system is presented in the synthetic manner in the Ethics. But the geometrical style of presentation is not merely a pedagogical device in Spinoza’s case. It is also a clue to the nature of his system.

c. Leibniz

Leibniz is openly critical of Descartes’ distinction between analysis and synthesis, writing, “Those who think that the analytic presentation consists in revealing the origin of a discovery, the synthetic in keeping it concealed, are in error” (L, 233). This comment is aimed at Descartes’ formulation of the distinction in the Second Replies. Leibniz is explicit about his adherence to the viewpoint that seems to be implied by Spinoza’s methodology: synthesis is itself a means of discovering truth no less than analysis, not merely a mode of presentation. Leibniz’s understanding of analysis and synthesis is closer to the Hobbesian conception, which views analysis and synthesis as different directions of causal reasoning: from effects to causes (analysis) and from causes to effects (synthesis). Leibniz formulates the distinction in his own terms as follows:

Synthesis is achieved when we begin from principles and run through truths in good order, thus discovering certain progressions and setting up tables, or sometimes general formulas, in which the answers to emerging questions can later be discovered. Analysis goes back to the principles in order to solve the given problems only […] (L, 232)

Leibniz thus conceives synthesis and analysis in relation to principles.

Leibniz lays great stress on the importance of establishing the possibility of ideas, that is to say, establishing that ideas do not involve contradiction, and this applies a fortiori to first principles. For Leibniz, the Cartesian criterion of clear and distinct perception does not suffice for establishing the possibility of an idea. Leibniz is critical, in particular, of Descartes’ ontological argument on the grounds that Descartes neglects to demonstrate the possibility of the idea of a most perfect being on which the argument depends. It is possible to mistakenly assume that an idea is possible, when in reality it is contradictory. Leibniz gives the example of a wheel turning at the fastest possible rate. It might at first seem that this idea is legitimate, but if a spoke of the wheel were extended beyond the rim, the end of the spoke would move faster than a nail in the rim itself, revealing a contradiction in the original notion.

For Leibniz, there are two ways of establishing the possibility of an idea: by experience (a posteriori) and by reducing concepts via analysis down to a relation of identity (a priori). Leibniz credits mathematicians and geometers with pushing the practice of demonstrating what would otherwise normally be taken for granted the furthest. For example, in Meditations on Knowledge, Truth, and Ideas, Leibniz writes, “That brilliant genius Pascal agrees entirely with these principles when he says, in his famous dissertation on the geometrical spirit […] that it is the task of the geometer to define all terms though ever so little obscure and to prove all truths though little doubtful” (L, 294). Leibniz credits his own doctrine of the possibility of ideas with clarifying exactly what it means for something to be beyond doubt and obscurity.

Leibniz describes the result of the reduction of concepts to identity variously as follows: when the thing is resolved into simple primitive notions understood in themselves (L, 231); “when every ingredient that enters into a distinct concept is itself known distinctly”; “when analysis is carried through to the end” (L, 292). Since, for Leibniz, all true ideas can be reduced to simple identities, it is, in principle, possible to derive all truths via a movement of synthesis from such simple identities in the way that mathematicians produce systems of knowledge on the basis of their basic definitions and axioms. This kind of a priori knowledge of the world is restricted to God, however. According to Leibniz, it is only possible for our finite minds to have this kind of knowledge – which Leibniz calls “intuitive” or “adequate” – in the case of things which do not depend on experience, or what Leibniz also calls “truths of reason,” which include abstract logical and metaphysical truths, and mathematical propositions. In the case of “truths of fact,” by contrast, with the exception of immediately graspable facts of experience, such as, “I think,” and “Various things are thought by me,” we are restricted to formulating hypotheses to explain the phenomena of sensory experience, and such knowledge of the world can, for us, only ever achieve the status of hypothesis, though our hypothetical knowledge can be continually improved and refined. (See Section 5, c, below for a discussion of hypotheses in Leibniz.)

Leibniz is in line with his rationalist predecessors in emphasizing the importance of proper order in philosophizing. Leibniz’s emphasis on establishing the possibility of ideas prior to using them in demonstrating propositions could be understood as a refinement of the geometrical order that Descartes established over against the order of subject-matter. Leibniz emphasizes order in another connection vis-à-vis Locke. As Leibniz makes clear in his New Essays, one of the clearest points of disagreement between him and Locke is on the question of innate ideas. In preliminary comments that Leibniz drew up upon first reading Locke’s Essay, and which he sent to Locke via Burnett, Leibniz makes the following point regarding philosophical order:

Concerning the question whether there are ideas and truths born with us, I do not find it absolutely necessary for the beginnings, nor for the practice of the art of thinking, to answer it; whether they all come to us from outside, or they come from within us, we will reason correctly provided that we keep in mind what I said above, and that we proceed with order and without prejudice. The question of the origin of our ideas and of our maxims is not preliminary in philosophy, and it is necessary to have made great progress in order to resolve it. (Philosophische Schriften, vol. 5, pp. 15-16)

Leibniz’s allusion to what he “said above” refers to remarks regarding the establishment of the possibility of ideas via experience and the principle of identity. This passage makes it clear that, from Leibniz’s point of view, the order in which Locke philosophizes is quite misguided, since Locke begins with a question that should only be addressed after “great progress” has already been made, particularly with respect to the criteria for distinguishing between true and false ideas, and for establishing legitimate philosophical principles. Empiricists generally put much less emphasis on the order of philosophizing, since they do not aim to reason from first principles grasped a priori.

4. A Priori Principles

A fundamental tenet of rationalism – perhaps the fundamental tenet – is that the world is intelligible. The intelligibility tenet means that everything that happens in the world happens in an orderly, lawful, rational manner, and that the mind, in principle, if not always in practice, is able to reproduce the interconnections of things in thought provided that it adheres to certain rules of right reasoning. The intelligibility of the world is sometimes couched in terms of a denial of brute facts, where a “brute fact” is something that “just is the case,” that is, something that obtains without any reason or explanation (even in principle). Many of the a priori principles associated with rationalism can be understood either as versions or implications of the principle of intelligibility. As such, the principle of intelligibility functions as a basic principle of rationalism. It appears under various guises in the great rationalist systems and is used to generate contrasting philosophical systems. Indeed, one of the chief criticisms of rationalism is the fact that its principles can consistently be used to generate contradictory conclusions and systems of thought. The clearest and best known statement of the intelligibility of the world is Leibniz’s principle of sufficient reason. Some scholars have recently emphasized this principle as the key to understanding rationalism (see Della Rocca 2008, chapter 1).

The intelligibility principle raises some classic philosophical problems. Chief among these is a problem of question-begging or circularity. The task of proving that the world is intelligible seems to have to rely on some of the very principles of reasoning in question. In the 17^th century, discussion of this fundamental problem centered around the so-called “Cartesian circle.” The problem is still debated by scholars of 17^th century thought today. The viability of the rationalist enterprise seems to depend, at least in part, on a satisfactory answer to this problem.

a. Intelligibility and the Cartesian Circle

The most important rational principle in Descartes’ philosophy, the principle which does a great deal of the work in generating its details, is the principle according to which whatever is clearly and distinctly perceived to be true is true. This principle means that if we can form any clear and distinct ideas, then we will be able to trust that they accurately represent their objects, and give us certain knowledge of reality. Descartes’ clear and distinct ideas doctrine is central to his conception of the world’s intelligibility, and indeed, it is central to the rationalists’ conception of the world’s intelligibility more broadly. Although Spinoza and Leibniz both work to refine understanding of what it is to have clear and distinct ideas, they both subscribe to the view that the mind, when directed properly, is able to accurately represent certain basic features of reality, such as the nature of substance.

For Descartes, it cannot be taken for granted from the outset that what we clearly and distinctly perceive to be true is in fact true. It is possible to entertain the doubt that an all-powerful deceiving being fashioned the mind so that it is deceived even in those things it perceives clearly and distinctly. Nevertheless, it is only possible to entertain this doubt when we are not having clear and distinct perceptions. When we are perceiving things clearly and distinctly, their truth is undeniable. Moreover, we can use our capacity for clear and distinct perceptions to demonstrate that the mind was not fashioned by an all-powerful deceiving being, but rather by an all-powerful benevolent being who would not fashion us so as to be deceived even when using our minds properly. Having proved the existence of an all-powerful benevolent being qua creator of our minds, we can no longer entertain any doubts regarding our clear and distinct ideas even when we are not presently engaged in clear and distinct perceptions.

Descartes’ legitimation of clear and distinct perception via his proof of a benevolent God raises notorious interpretive challenges. Scholars disagree about how to resolve the problem of the “Cartesian circle.” However, there is general consensus that Descartes’ procedure is not, in fact, guilty of vicious, logical circularity. In order for Descartes’ procedure to avoid circularity, it is generally agreed that in some sense clear and distinct ideas need already to be legitimate before the proof of God’s existence. It is only in another sense that God’s existence legitimates their truth. Scholars disagree on how exactly to understand those different senses, but they generally agree that there is some sense at least in which clear and distinct ideas are self-legitimating, or, otherwise, not in need of legitimation.

That some ideas provide a basic standard of truth is a fundamental tenet of rationalism, and undergirds all the other rationalist principles at work in the construction of rationalist systems of philosophy. For the rationalists, if it cannot be taken for granted in at least some sense from the outset that the mind is capable of discerning the difference between truth and falsehood, then one never gets beyond skepticism.

b. Substance Metaphysics

The Continental rationalists deploy the principle of intelligibility and subordinate rational principles derived from it in generating much of the content of their respective philosophical systems. In no aspect of their systems is the application of rational principles to the generation of philosophical content more evident and more clearly illustrative of contrasting interpretations of these principles than in that for which the Continental rationalists are arguably best known: substance metaphysics.

i. Descartes

Descartes deploys his clear and distinct ideas doctrine in justifying his most well-known metaphysical position: substance dualism. The first step in Descartes’ demonstration of mind-body dualism, or, in his terminology, of a “real” distinction (that is, a distinction between two substances) between mind and body is to show that while it is possible to doubt that one has a body, it is not possible to doubt that one is thinking. As Descartes makes clear in the Principles of Philosophy, one of the chief upshots of his famous cogito argument is the discovery of the distinction between a thinking thing and a corporeal thing. The impossibility of doubting one’s existence is not the impossibility of doubting that one is a human being with a body with arms and legs and a head. It is the impossibility of doubting, rather, that one doubts, perceives, dreams, imagines, understands, wills, denies, and other modalities that Descartes attributes to the thinking thing. It is possible to think of oneself as a thing that thinks, and to recognize that it is impossible to doubt that one thinks, while continuing to doubt that one has a body with arms and legs and a head. So, the cogito drives a preliminary wedge between mind and body.

At this stage of the argument, however, Descartes has simply established that it is possible to conceive of himself as a thinking thing without conceiving of himself as a corporeal thing. It remains possible that, in fact, the thinking thing is identical with a corporeal thing, in other words, that thought is somehow something a body can do; Descartes has yet to establish that the epistemological distinction between his knowledge of his mind and his knowledge of body that results from the hyperbolic doubt translates to a metaphysical or ontological distinction between mind and body. The move from the epistemological distinction to the ontological distinction proceeds via the doctrine of clear and distinct ideas. Having established that whatever he clearly and distinctly perceives is true, Descartes is in a position to affirm the real distinction between mind and body.

In this life, it is never possible to clearly and distinctly perceive a mind actually separate from a body, at least in the case of finite, created minds, because minds and bodies are intimately unified in the composite human being. So Descartes cannot base his proof for the real distinction of mind and body on the clear and distinct perception that mind and body are in fact independently existing things. Rather, Descartes’ argument is based on the joint claims that (1) it is possible to have a clear and distinct idea of thought apart from extension and vice versa; and (2) whatever we can clearly and distinctly understand is capable of being created by God exactly as we clearly and distinctly understand it. Thus, the fact that we can clearly and distinctly understand thought apart from extension and vice versa entails that thinking things and extended things are “really” distinct (in the sense that they are distinct substances separable by God).

The foregoing argument relies on certain background assumptions which it is now necessary to explain, in particular, Descartes’ conception of substance. In the Principles, Descartes defines substance as “a thing which exists in such a way as to depend on no other thing for its existence” (CSM I, 210). Properly speaking, only God can be understood to depend on no other thing, and so only God is a substance in the absolute sense. Nevertheless, Descartes allows that, in a relative sense, created things can count as substances too. A created thing is a substance if the only thing it relies upon for its existence is “the ordinary concurrence of God” (ibid.). Only mind and body qualify as substances in this secondary sense. Everything else is a modification or property of minds and bodies. A second point is that, for Descartes, we do not have a direct knowledge of substance; rather, we come to know substance by virtue of its attributes. Thought and extension are the attributes or properties in virtue of which we come to know thinking and corporeal substance, or “mind” and “body.” This point relies on the application of a key rational principle, to wit, nothingness has no properties. For Descartes, there cannot simply be the properties of thinking and extension without these properties having something in which to inhere. Thinking and extension are not just any properties; Descartes calls them “principal attributes” because they constitute the nature of their respective substances. Other, non-essential properties, cannot be understood without the principal attribute, but the principal attribute can be understood without any of the non-essential properties. For example, motion cannot be understood without extension, but extension can be understood without motion.

Descartes’ conception of mind and body as distinct substances includes some interesting corollaries which result from a characteristic application of rational principles and account for some characteristic doctrinal differences between Descartes and empiricist philosophers. One consequence of Descartes’ conception of the mind as a substance whose principal attribute is thought is that the mind must always be thinking. Since, for Descartes, thinking is something of which the thinker is necessarily aware, Descartes’ commitment to thought as an essential, and therefore, inseparable, property of the mind raises some awkward difficulties. Arnauld, for example, raises one such difficulty in his Objections to Descartes’ Meditations: presumably there is much going on in the mind of an infant in its mother’s womb of which the infant is not aware. In response to this objection, and also in response to another obvious problem, that is, that of dreamless sleep, Descartes insists on a distinction between being aware of or conscious of our thoughts at the time we are thinking them, and remembering them afterwards (CSMK III, 357). The infant is, in fact, aware of its thinking in the mother’s womb, but it is aware only of very confused sensory thoughts of pain and pleasure and heat (not, as Descartes points out, metaphysical matters (CSMK III, 189)) which it does not remember afterwards. Similarly, the mind is always thinking even in the most “dreamless sleep,” it is just that the mind often immediately forgets much of what it had been aware.

Descartes’ commitment to embracing the implications – however counter-intuitive – of his substance-attribute metaphysics, puts him at odds with, for instance, Locke, who mocks the Cartesian doctrine of the always-thinking soul in his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. For Locke, the question whether the soul is always thinking or not must be decided by experience and not, as Locke says, merely by “hypothesis” (An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, Book II, Chapter 1). The evidence of dreamless sleep makes it obvious, for Locke, that the soul is not always thinking. Because Locke ties personal identity to memory, if the soul were to think while asleep without knowing it, the sleeping man and the waking man would be two different persons.

Descartes’ commitment to the always-thinking mind is a consequence of his commitment to a more basic rational principle. In establishing his conception of thinking substance, Descartes reasons from the attribute of thinking to the substance of thinking on the grounds that nothing has no properties. In this case, he reasons in the other direction, from the substance of thinking, that is, the mind, to the property of thinking on the converse grounds that something must have properties, and the properties it must have are the properties that make it what it is; in the case of the mind, that property is thought. (Leibniz found a way to maintain the integrity of the rational principle without contradicting experience: admit that thinking need not be conscious. This way the mind can still think in a dreamless sleep, and so avoid being without any properties, without any problem about the recollection of awareness.)

Another consequence of Descartes’ substance metaphysics concerns corporeal substance. For Descartes, we do not know corporeal substance directly, but rather through a grasp of its principal attribute, extension. Extension qua property requires a substance in which to inhere because of the rational principle, nothing has no properties. This rational principle leads to another characteristic Cartesian position regarding the material world: the denial of a vacuum. Descartes denies that space can be empty or void. Space has the property of being extended in length, breadth, and depth, and such properties require a substance in which to inhere. Thus, nothing, that is, a void or vacuum, is not able to have such properties because of the rational principle, nothing has no properties. This means that all space is filled with substance, even if it is imperceptible. Once again, Descartes answers a debated philosophical question on the basis of a rational principle.

ii. Spinoza

If Descartes is known for his dualism, Spinoza, of course, is known for monism – the doctrine that there is only one substance. Spinoza’s argument for substance monism (laid out in the first fifteen propositions of the Ethics) has no essential basis in sensory experience; it proceeds through rational argumentation and the deployment of rational principles; although Spinoza provides one a posteriori argument for God’s existence, he makes clear that he presents it only because it is easier to grasp than the a priori arguments, and not because it is in any way necessary.

The crucial step in the argument for substance monism comes in Ethics 1p5: “In Nature there cannot be two or more substances of the same nature or attribute.” It is at this proposition that Descartes (and Leibniz, and many others) would part ways with Spinoza. The most striking and controversial implication of this proposition, at least from a Cartesian perspective, is that human minds cannot qualify as substances, since human minds all share the same nature or attribute, that is, thought. In Spinoza’s philosophy, human minds are actually themselves properties – Spinoza calls them “modes” – of a more basic, infinite substance.

The argument for 1p5 works as follows. If there were two or more distinct substances, there would have to be some way to distinguish between them. There are two possible distinctions to be made: either by a difference in their affections or by a difference in their attributes. For Spinoza, a substance is something which exists in itself and can be conceived through itself; an attribute is “what the intellect perceives of a substance, as constituting its essence” (Ethics 1d4). Spinoza’s conception of attributes is a matter of longstanding scholarly debate, but for present purposes, we can think of it along Cartesian lines. For Descartes, substance is always grasped through a principal property, which is the nature or essence of the substance. Spinoza agrees that an attribute is that through which the mind conceives the nature or essence of substance. With this in mind, if a distinction between two substances were to be made on the basis of a difference in attributes, then there would not be two substances of the same attribute as the proposition indicates. This means that if there were two substances of the same attribute, it would be necessary to distinguish between them on the basis of a difference in modes or affections.

Spinoza conceives of an affection or mode as something which exists in another and needs to be conceived through another. Given this conception of affections, it is impossible, for Spinoza, to distinguish between two substances on the basis of a difference in affections. Doing so would be somewhat akin to affirming that there are two apples on the basis of a difference between two colors, when one apple can quite possibly have a red part and a green part. As color differences do not per se determine differences between apples, in a similar way, modal differences cannot determine a difference between substances – you could just be dealing with one substance bearing multiple different affections. It is notable that in 1p5, Spinoza uses virtually the same substance-attribute schema as Descartes to deny a fundamental feature of Descartes’ system.

Having established 1p5, the next major step in Spinoza’s argument for substance monism is to establish the necessary existence and infinity of substance. For Spinoza, if things have nothing in common with each other, one cannot be the cause of the other. This thesis depends upon assumptions that lie at the heart of Spinoza’s rationalism. Something that has nothing in common with another thing cannot be the cause of the other thing because things that have nothing in common with one another cannot be understood through one another (Ethics 1a5). But, for Spinoza, effects should be able to be understood through causes. Indeed, what it is to understand something, for Spinoza, is to understand its cause. The order of knowledge, provided that the knowledge is genuine, or, as Spinoza says, “adequate,” must map onto the order of being, and vice versa. Thus, Spinoza’s claim that if things have nothing in common with one another, one cannot be the cause of the other, is an expression of Spinoza’s fundamental, rationalist commitment to the intelligibility of the world. Given this assumption, and given the fact that no two substances have anything in common with one another, since no two substances share the same nature or attribute, it follows that if a substance is to exist, it must exist as causa sui (self-caused); in other words, it must pertain to the essence of substance to exist. Moreover, Spinoza thinks that since there is nothing that has anything in common with a given substance, there is therefore nothing to limit the nature of a given substance, and so every substance will necessarily be infinite. This assertion depends on another deep-seated assumption of Spinoza’s philosophy: nothing limits itself, but everything by virtue of its very nature affirms its own nature and existence as much as possible.

At this stage, Spinoza has argued that substances of a single attribute exist necessarily and are necessarily infinite. The last major stage of the argument for substance monism is the transition from multiple substances of a single attribute to only one substance of infinite attributes. Scholars have expressed varying degrees of satisfaction with the lucidity of this transition. It seems to work as follows. It is possible to attribute many attributes to one substance. The more reality or being each thing has, the more attributes belong to it. Therefore, an absolutely infinite being is a being that consists of infinite attributes. Spinoza calls an absolutely infinite being or substance consisting of infinite attributes “God.” Spinoza gives four distinct arguments for God’s existence in Ethics 1p11. The first is commonly interpreted as Spinoza’s version of an ontological argument. It refers back to 1p7 where Spinoza proved that it pertains to the essence of substance to exist. The second argument is relevant to present purposes, since it turns on Spinoza’s version of the principle of sufficient reason: “For each thing there must be assigned a cause, or reason, both for its existence and for its nonexistence” (Ethics 1p11dem). But there can be no reason for God’s nonexistence for the same reasons that all substances are necessarily infinite: there is nothing outside of God that is able to limit Him, and nothing limits itself. Once again, Spinoza’s argument rests upon his assumption that things by nature affirm their own existence. The third argument is a posteriori, and the fourth pivots like the second on the assumption that things by nature affirm their own existence.

Having proven that a being consisting of infinite attributes exists, Spinoza’s argument for substance monism is nearly complete. It remains only to point out that no substance besides God can exist, because if it did, it would have to share at least one of God’s infinite attributes, which, by 1p5, is impossible. Everything that exists, then, is either an attribute or an affection of God.

iii. Leibniz

Leibniz’s universe consists of an infinity of monads or simple substances, and God. For Leibniz, the universe must be composed of monads or simple substances. His justification for this claim is relatively straightforward. There must be simples, because there are compounds, and compounds are just collections of simples. To be simple, for Leibniz, means to be without parts, and thus to be indivisible. For Leibniz, the simples or monads are the “true atoms of nature” (L, 643). However, “material atoms are contrary to reason” (L, 456). Manifold a priori considerations lead Leibniz to reject material atoms. In the first place, the notion of a material atom is contradictory in Leibniz’s view. Matter is extended, and that which is extended is divisible into parts. The very notion of an atom, however, is the notion of something indivisible, lacking parts.

From a different perspective, Leibniz’s dynamical investigations provide another argument against material atoms. Absolute rigidity is included in the notion of a material atom, since any elasticity in the atom could only be accounted for on the basis of parts within the atom shifting their position with respect to each other, which is contrary to the notion of a partless atom. According to Leibniz’s analysis of impact, however, absolute rigidity is shown not to make sense. Consider the rebound of one atom as a result of its collision with another. If the atoms were absolutely rigid, the change in motion resulting from the collision would have to happen instantaneously, or, as Leibniz says, “through a leap or in a moment” (L, 446). The atom would change from initial motion to rest to rebounded motion without passing through any intermediary degrees of motion. Since the body must pass through all the intermediary degrees of motion in transitioning from one state of motion to another, it must not be absolutely rigid, but rather elastic; the analysis of the parts of the body must, in correlation with the degree of motion, proceed to infinity. Leibniz’s dynamical argument against material atoms turns on what he calls the law of continuity, an a priori principle according to which “no change occurs through a leap.”

The true unities, or true atoms of nature, therefore, cannot be material; they must be spiritual or metaphysical substances akin to souls. Since Leibniz’s spiritual substances, or monads, are absolutely simple, without parts, they admit neither of dissolution nor composition. Moreover, there can be no interaction between monads, monads cannot receive impressions or undergo alterations by means of being affected from the outside, since, in Leibniz’s famous phrase from the Monadology, monads “have no windows” (L, 643). Monads must, however, have qualities, otherwise there would be no way to explain the changes we see in things and the diversity of nature. Indeed, following from Leibniz’s principle of the identity of indiscernibles, no two monads can be exactly alike, since each monad stands in a unique relation to the rest, and, for Leibniz, each monad’s relation to the rest is a distinctive feature of its nature. The way in which, for Leibniz, monads can have qualities while remaining simple, or in other words, the only way there can be multitude in simplicity is if monads are characterized and distinguished by means of their perceptions. Leibniz’s universe, in summary, consists in monads, simple spiritual substances, characterized and distinguished from one another by a unique series of perceptions determined by each monad’s unique relationship vis-à-vis the others.

Of the great rationalists, Leibniz is the most explicit about the principles of reasoning that govern his thought. Leibniz singles out two, in particular, as the most fundamental rational principles of his philosophy: the principle of contradiction and the principle of sufficient reason. According to the principle of contradiction, whatever involves a contradiction is false. According to the principle of sufficient reason, there is no fact or true proposition “without there being a sufficient reason for its being so and not otherwise” (L, 646). Corresponding to these two principles of reasoning are two kinds of truths: truths of reasoning and truths of fact. For Leibniz, truths of reasoning are necessary, and their opposite is impossible. Truths of fact, by contrast, are contingent, and their opposite is possible. Truths of reasoning are by most commentators associated with the principle of contradiction because they can be reduced via analysis to a relation between two primitive ideas, whose identity is intuitively evident. Thus, it is possible to grasp why it is impossible for truths of reasoning to be otherwise. However, this kind of resolution is only possible in the case of abstract propositions, such as the propositions of mathematics (see Section 3, c, above). Contingent truths, or truths of fact, by contrast, such as “Caesar crossed the Rubicon,” to use the example Leibniz gives in the Discourse on Metaphysics, are infinitely complicated. Although, for Leibniz, every predicate is contained in its subject, to reduce the relationship between Caesar’s “notion” and his action of crossing the Rubicon would require an infinite analysis impossible for finite minds. “Caesar crossed the Rubicon” is a contingent proposition, because there is another possible world in which Caesar did not cross the Rubicon. To understand the reason for Caesar’s crossing, then, entails understanding why this world exists rather than any other possible world. It is for this reason that contingent truths are associated with the principle of sufficient reason. Although the opposite of truths of fact is possible, there is nevertheless a sufficient reason why the fact is so and not otherwise, even though this reason cannot be known by finite minds.

Truths of fact, then, need to be explained; there must be a sufficient reason for them. However, according to Leibniz, “a sufficient reason for existence cannot be found merely in any one individual thing or even in the whole aggregate and series of things” (L, 486). That is to say, the sufficient reason for any given contingent fact cannot be found within the world of which it is a part. The sufficient reason must explain why this world exists rather than another possible world, and this reason must lie outside the world itself. For Leibniz, the ultimate reason for things must be contained in a necessary substance that creates the world, that is, God. But if the existence of God is to ground the series of contingent facts that make up the world, there must be a sufficient reason why God created this world rather than any of the other infinite possible worlds contained in his understanding. As a perfect being, God would only have chosen to bring this world into existence rather than any other because it is the best of all possible worlds. God’s choice, therefore, is governed by the principle of fitness, or what Leibniz also calls the “principle of the best” (L, 647). The best world, according to Leibniz, is the one which maximizes perfection; and the most perfect world is the one which balances the greatest possible variety with the greatest possible order. God achieves maximal perfection in the world through what Leibniz calls “the pre-established harmony.” Although the world is made up of an infinity of monads with no direct interaction with one another, God harmonizes the perceptions of each monad with the perceptions of every other monad, such that each monad represents a unique perspective on the rest of the universe according to its position vis-à-vis the others.

According to Leibniz’s philosophy, in the case of all true propositions, the predicate is contained in the subject. This is often known as the “predicate-in-notion” principle. The relationship between predicate and subject can only be reduced to an identity relation in the case of truths of reason, whereas in the case of truths of fact, the reduction requires an infinite analysis. Nevertheless, in both cases, it is possible in principle (which is to say, for an infinite intellect) to know everything that will ever happen to an individual substance, and even everything that will happen in the world of an individual substance on the basis of an examination of the individual substance’s notion, since each substance is an expression of the entire world. Leibniz’s predicate-in-notion principle therefore unifies both of his two great principles of reasoning – the principle of contradiction and the principle of sufficient reason – since the relation between predicate and subject is either such that it is impossible for it to be otherwise or such that there is a sufficient reason why it is as it is and not otherwise. Moreover, it represents a particularly robust expression of the principle of intelligibility at the very heart of Leibniz’s system. There is a reason why everything is as it is, whether that reason is subject to finite or only to infinite analysis.

5. Continental Rationalism, Experience, and Experiment

Rationalism is often criticized for placing too much confidence in the ability of reason alone to know the world. The extent to which one finds this criticism justified depends largely on one’s view of reason. For Hume, for instance, knowledge of the world of “matters of fact” is gained exclusively through experience; reason is merely a faculty for comparing ideas gained through experience; it is thus parasitic upon experience, and has no claim whatsoever to grasp anything about the world itself, let alone any special claim. For Kant, reason is a mental faculty with an inherent tendency to transgress the bounds of possible experience in an effort to grasp the metaphysical foundations of the phenomenal realm. Since knowledge of the world is limited to objects of possible experience, for Kant, reason, with its delusions of grasping reality beyond those limits, must be subject to critique.

Sometimes rationalism is charged with neglecting or undervaluing experience, and with embarrassingly having no means of accounting for the tremendous success of the experimental sciences. While the criticism of the confidence placed in reason may be defensible given a certain conception of reason (which may or may not itself be ultimately defensible), the latter charge of neglecting experience is not; more often than not it is the product of a false caricature of rationalism

Descartes and Leibniz were the leading mathematicians of their day, and stood at the forefront of science. While Spinoza distinguished himself more as a political thinker, and as an interpreter of scripture (albeit a notorious one) than as a mathematician, Spinoza too performed experiments, kept abreast of the leading science of the day, and was renowned as an expert craftsman of lenses. Far from neglecting experience, the great rationalists had, in general, a sophisticated understanding of the role of experience and, indeed, of experiment, in the acquisition and development of knowledge. The fact that the rationalists held that experience and experiment cannot serve as foundations for knowledge, but must be fitted within, and interpreted in light of, a rational epistemic framework, should not be confused with a neglect of experience and experiment.

a. Descartes

One of the stated purposes of Descartes’ Meditations, and, in particular, the hyperbolic doubts with which it commences, is to reveal to the mind of the reader the limitations of its reliance on the senses, which Descartes regards as an inadequate foundation for knowledge. By leading the mind away from the senses, which often deceive, and which yield only confused ideas, Descartes prepares the reader to discover the clear and distinct perceptions of the pure intellect, which provide a proper foundation for genuine knowledge. Nevertheless, empirical observations and experimentation clearly had an important role to play in Descartes’ natural philosophy, as evidenced by his own private empirical and experimental research, especially in optics and anatomy, and by his explicit statements in several writings on the role and importance of observation and experiment.

In Part 6 of the Discourse on the Method, Descartes makes an open plea for assistance – both financial and otherwise – in making systematic empirical observations and conducting experiments. Also in Discourse Part 6, Descartes lays out his program for developing knowledge of nature. It begins with the discovery of “certain seeds of truth” implanted naturally in our souls (CSM I, 144). From them, Descartes seeks to derive the first principles and causes of everything. Descartes’ Meditations illustrates these first stages of the program. By “seeds of truth” Descartes has in mind certain intuitions, including the ideas of thinking, and extension, and, in particular, of God. On the basis of clearly and distinctly perceiving the distinction between what belongs properly to extension (figure, position, motion) and what does not (colors, sounds, smells, and so forth), Descartes discovers the principles of physics, including the laws of motion. From these principles, it is possible to deduce many particular ways in which the details of the world might be, only a small fraction of which represent the way the world actually is. It is as a result of the distance, as it were, between physical principles and laws of nature, on one hand, and the particular details of the world, on the other, that, for Descartes, observations and experiments become necessary.

Descartes is ambivalent about the relationship between physical principles and particulars, and about the role that observation and experiment play in mediating this relationship. On the one hand, Descartes expresses commitment to the ideal of a science deduced with certainty from intuitively grasped first principles. Because of the great variety of mutually incompatible consequences that can be derived from physical principles, observation and experiment are required even in the ideal deductive science to discriminate between actual consequences and merely possible ones. According to the ideal of deductive science, however, observation and experiment should be used only to facilitate the deduction of effects from first causes, and not as a basis for an inference to possible explanations of natural phenomena, as Descartes makes clear at one point his Principles of Philosophy (CSM I, 249). If the explanations were only possible, or hypothetical, the science could not lay claim to certainty per the deductive ideal, but merely to probability.

On the other hand, Descartes states explicitly at another point in the Principles of Philosophy that the explanations provided of such phenomena as the motion of celestial bodies and the nature of the earth’s elements should be regarded merely as hypotheses arrived at on the basis of a posteriori reasoning (CSM I, 255); while Descartes says that such hypotheses must agree with observation and facilitate predictions, they need not in fact reflect the actual causes of phenomena. Descartes appears to concede, albeit reluctantly, that when it comes to explaining particular phenomena, hypothetical explanations and moral certainty (that is, mere probability) are all that can be hoped for.

Scholars have offered a range of explanations for the inconsistency in Descartes’ writings on the question of the relation between first principles and particulars. It has been suggested that the inconsistency within the Principles of Philosophy reflects different stages of its composition (see Garber 1978). However the inconsistency might be explained, it is clear that Descartes did not take it for granted that the ideal of a deductive science of nature could be realized. Moreover, whether or not Descartes ultimately believed the ideal of deductive science was realizable, he was unambiguous on the importance of observation and experiment in bridging the distance between physical principles and particular phenomena. (For further discussion, see René Descartes: Scientific Method.)

b. Spinoza

The one work that Spinoza published under his own name in his lifetime was his geometrical reworking of Descartes’ Principles of Philosophy. In Spinoza’s presentation of the opening sections of Part 3 of Descartes’ Principles, Spinoza puts a strong emphasis on the hypothetical nature of the explanations of natural phenomena in Part 3. Given the hesitance and ambivalence with which Descartes concedes the hypothetical nature of his explanations in his Principles, Spinoza’s unequivocal insistence on hypotheses is striking. Elsewhere Spinoza endorses hypotheses more directly. In the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, Spinoza describes forming the concept of a sphere by affirming the rotation of a semicircle in thought. He points out that this idea is a true idea of a sphere even if no sphere has ever been produced this way in nature (The Collected Works of Spinoza, Vol. 1, p. 32). Spinoza’s view of hypotheses relates to his conception of good definitions (see Section 3, b, above). If the cause through which one conceives something allows for the deduction of all possible effects, then the cause is an adequate one, and there is no need to fear a false hypothesis. Spinoza appears to differ from Descartes in thinking that the formation of hypotheses, if done properly, is consistent with deductive certainty, and not tantamount to mere probability or moral certainty.

Again in the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, Spinoza speaks in Baconian fashion of identifying “aids” that can assist in the use of the senses and in conducting orderly experiments. Unfortunately, Spinoza’s comments regarding “aids” are very unclear. This is perhaps explained by the fact that they appear in a work that Spinoza never finished. Nevertheless, it does seem clear that although Spinoza, like Descartes, emphasized the importance of discovering proper principles from which to deduce knowledge of everything else, he was no less aware than Descartes of the need to proceed via observation and experiment in descending from such principles to particulars. At the same time, given his analysis of the inadequacy of sensory images, the collection of empirical data must be governed by rules and rational guidelines the details of which it does not seem that Spinoza ever worked out.

A valuable perspective on Spinoza’s attitude toward experimentation is provided by Letter 6, which Spinoza wrote to Oldenburg with comments on Robert Boyle’s experimental research. Among other matters, at issue is Boyle’s “redintegration” (or reconstitution) of niter (potassium nitrate). By heating niter with a burning coal, Boyle separated the niter into a “fixed” part and a volatile part; he then proceeded to distill the volatile part, and recombine it with the fixed part, thereby redintegrating the niter. Boyle’s aim was to show that the nature of niter is not determined by a Scholastic “substantial form,” but rather by the composition of parts, whose secondary qualities (color, taste, smell, and so forth) are determined by primary qualities (size, position, motion, and so forth). While taking no issue with Boyle’s attempt to undermine the Scholastic analysis of physical natures, Spinoza criticized Boyle’s interpretation of the experiment, arguing that the fixed niter was merely an impurity left over, and that there was no difference between the niter and the volatile part other than a difference of state.

Two things stand out from Spinoza’s comments on Boyle. On the one hand, Spinoza exhibits a degree of impatience with Boyle’s experiments, charging some of them with superfluity on the grounds either that what they show is evident on the basis of reason alone, or that previous philosophers have already sufficiently demonstrated them experimentally. In addition, Spinoza’s own interpretation of Boyle’s experiment is primarily based in a rather speculative, Cartesian account of the mechanical constitution of niter (as Boyle himself points out in response to Spinoza). On the other hand, Spinoza appears eager to show his own fluency with experimental practice, describing no fewer than three different experiments of his own invention to support his interpretation of the redintegration. What Spinoza is critical of is not so much Boyle’s use of experiment per se as his relative neglect of relevant rational considerations. For instance, Spinoza at one point criticizes Boyle for trying to show that secondary qualities depend on primary qualities on experimental grounds. Spinoza thought the proposition needed to be demonstrated on rational grounds. While Spinoza acknowledges the importance and necessity of observation and experiment, his emphasis and focus is on the rational framework needed for making sense of experimental findings, without which the results are confused and misleading.

c. Leibniz

In principle, Leibniz thinks it is not impossible to discover the interior constitution of bodies a priori on the basis of a knowledge of God and the “principle of the best” according to which He creates the world. Leibniz sometimes remarks that angels could explain to us the intelligible causes through which all things come about, but he seems conflicted over whether such understanding is actually possible for human beings. Leibniz seems to think that while the a priori pathway should be pursued in this life by the brightest minds in any case, its perfection will only be possible in the afterlife. The obstacle to an a priori conception of things is the complexity of sensible effects. In this life, then, knowledge of nature cannot be purely a priori, but depends on observation and experimentation in conjunction with reason

Apart from perception, we have clear and distinct ideas only of magnitude, figure, motion, and other such quantifiable attributes (primary qualities). The goal of all empirical research must be to resolve phenomena (including secondary qualities) into such distinctly perceived, quantifiable notions. For example, heat is explained in terms of some particular motion of air or some other fluid. Only in this way can the epistemic ideal be achieved of understanding how phenomena follow from their causes in the same way that we know how the hammer stroke after a period of time follows from the workings of a clock (L, 173). To this end, experiments must be carried out to indicate possible relationships between secondary qualities and primary qualities, and to provide a basis for the formulation of hypotheses to explain the phenomena.

Nevertheless, there is an inherent limitation to this procedure. Leibniz explains that if there were people who had no direct experience of heat, for instance, even if someone were to explain to them the precise mechanical cause of heat, they would still not be able to know the sensation of heat, because they would still not distinctly grasp the connection between bodily motion and perception (L, 285). Leibniz seems to think that human beings will never be able to bridge the explanatory gap between sensations and mechanical causes. There will always be an irreducibly confused aspect of sensible ideas, even if they can be associated with a high degree of sophistication with distinctly perceivable, quantifiable notions. However, this limitation does not mean, for Leibniz, that there is any futility in human efforts to understand the world scientifically. In the first place, experimental knowledge of the composition of things is tremendously useful in practice, even if the composition is not distinctly perceived in all its parts. As Leibniz points out, the architect who uses stones to erect a cathedral need not possess a distinct knowledge of the bits of earth interposed between the stones (L, 175). Secondly, even if our understanding of the causes of sensible effects must remain forever hypothetical, the hypotheses themselves can be more or less refined, and it is proper experimentation that assists in their refinement.

6. References and Further Reading

When citing the works of Descartes, the three volume English translation by Cottingham, Stoothoff, Murdoch, and Kenny was used. For the original language, the edition by Adam and Tannery was consulted.

When citing Spinoza’s Ethics, the translation by Curley in A Spinoza Reader was used. The following system of abbreviation was used when citing passages from the Ethics: the first number designates the part of the Ethics (1-5); then, “p” is for proposition, “d” for definition, “a” for axiom, “dem” for demonstration, “c” for corollary, and “s” for scholium. So, 1p17s refers to the scholium of the seventeenth proposition of the first part of the Ethics. For the original language, the edition by Gebhardt was consulted.

For the original language in Leibniz, the edition by Gerhardt was consulted.

a. Primary Sources

Bacon, Francis. The Works of Francis Bacon. 7 Volumes. Edited by J. Spedding, R. L. Ellis, and D.D. Heath. London: Longmans, 1857-70. Cited above as Spedding, volume, page.
Bacon, Francis. The New Organon. Edited by Lisa Jardine and Michael Silverthorne. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
Descartes, René. Oeuvres de Descartes. 12 Volumes. Edited by C. Adam and P. Tannery. Paris: J. Vrin, 1964-76.
Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. 3 vols. Vols. 1 and 2 translated by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch. Vol. 3 translated by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch, and Anthony Kenny. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1984-91. Cited above as CSM or CSMK, volume, page.
Hegel, G.W.F. Werke in zwanzig Bänden: Vorlesungen über die Geschichte der Philosophie: Werke XX. Edited by Eva Moldenhauer and Karl Markus Michel. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Verlag, 1986. Cited as Werke, volume, page.
Hobbes, Thomas. The English Works of Thomas Hobbes of Malmesbury, Volume 1. London: John Bohn, 1839.
Leibniz, G.W. Philosophische Schriften. 7 Volumes. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin, 1875-90.
Leibniz, G.W. Philosophical Papers and Letters. Second Edition. Translated and edited by Leroy E. Loemker. Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989. Cited above as L, page.
Leibniz, G.W. New Essays on Human Understanding. Translated and edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1996. Cited above as NE, page.
Locke, John. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Peter H. Nidditch. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 1979.
Malebranche, Nicholas. The Search after Truth. Translated and edited by Thomas M. Lennon and Paul J. Olscamp. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
Spinoza, Benedict de. Spinoza Opera. 4 Volumes. Edited by C. Gebhardt. Heidelberg: Carl Winter, 1925.
Spinoza, Benedict de. The Collected Works of Spinoza. Vol. 1. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1985.
Spinoza, Benedict de. A Spinoza Reader: The Ethics and Other Works. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1994.
Spinoza, Benedict de. Spinoza: Complete Works. Translated by Samuel Shirley and edited by Michael L. Morgan. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 2002.

b. Secondary Sources

Ayers, Michael (ed.). Rationalism, Platonism and God. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 2007.
Biasutti, Franco. “Reason and Experience in Leibniz and Spinoza” in Studia Spinozana, Volume 6, Spinoza and Leibniz (1990): 45-71.
Cottingham, John. The Rationalists. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 1988.
Della Rocca, Michael. Spinoza. London: Routledge, 2008.
Fraenkel, Carlos; Perinetti, Dario; Smith, Justin E.H. (eds.). The Rationalists: Between Tradition and Innovation. Dordrecht: Springer, 2011.
Gabbey, Alan. “Spinoza’s natural science and methodology” in The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza, edited by Don Garrett. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Garber, Daniel. “Science and Certainty in Descartes” in Descartes: Critical and Interpretive Essays, edited by Michael Hooker. Baltimore, MD: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1978.
Garber, Daniel. Descartes Embodied: Reading Cartesian Philosophy through Cartesian Science. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Huenemann, Charlie. Understanding Rationalism. Durham, UK: Acumen Publishing, 2008.
Leduc, Christian. “Leibniz and Sensible Qualities” in British Journal for the History of Philosophy. 18(5), 2010: 797-819.
Nelson, Alan (ed.). A Companion to Rationalism. Oxford, UK: Blackwell, 2005.
Pereboom, Derk (ed.). The Rationalists: Critical Essays on Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz. Rowman & Littlefield, 1999.
Phemister, Pauline. The Rationalists: Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz. Polity, 2006.
Wilson, Margaret Dauler. Ideas and Mechanism: Essays on Early Modern Philosophy. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1999.

Author Information

Matthew Homan
Email: matthew.homan@cnu.edu
Christopher Newport University
U. S. A.

Knowledge Norms

Epistemology has seen a surge of interest in the idea that knowledge provides a normative constraint or rule governing certain actions or mental states. Such interest is generated in part by noticing that fundamentally epistemic notions, such as belief, evidence, and justification, figure prominently not only in theorizing about knowledge, but also in our everyday evaluations of each others’ actions, reasoning, and doxastic commitments. The three most prominent proposals to emerge from the epistemology literature have been that knowledge is the norm of assertion, the norm of action, and the norm of belief, though we shall consider other proposals as well.

‘Norm’ here is often, but not always, understood as a rule which is intimately related to the action/mental state type in question, such that this relationship is a constitutive one: the action or mental state is constituted (in part) by its relationship to the rule. Typically such views argue for a norm of permission such that knowledge is required, as a necessary condition, for permissibly acting or being in the relevant mental state: in schematic form, one must: X only if one knows a relevantly specified proposition. Some philosophers also endorse a sufficiency condition as well, so that knowledge is necessary and sufficient for (epistemic) permission to X, such that one must: X if and only if one knows a relevantly specific proposition. Such views put knowledge to work in elucidating normative concepts, practical rationality, and conceptual priorities in epistemology, mind, and decision theory. This article outlines the growing literature on these topics.

Knowledge Norm of Assertion
Knowledge Norm of Action
Knowledge Norm of Belief
1. The Belief-Assertion Parallel
2. Knowledge Disagreement Norm
References and Further Reading

1. Knowledge Norm of Assertion

Assertion is the speech act we use to make claims about the way things are: in English, asserting is the default speech act for uttering a sentence in the indicative or declarative mood, such as when one tells someone, “John is in his office” (for an overview of assertion, including ways of characterizing it that do not make essential appeal to epistemic norms, see MacFarlane 2011). The recent literature on the norms of assertion has concentrated on whether there is a rule governing the speech act of assertion which specifies a necessary condition for making the speech act permissible on that occasion; section 1.D below briefly discusses the idea of a sufficient condition for permissible assertion. The view has its roots in the work of philosophers who argued that when one asserts, claims, or declares that p (which are to be distinguished from simply uttering “p”) one somehow thereby represents oneself as knowing that p, even though p itself may not refer to the speaker’s knowledge at all (see Moore 1962: 277; Moore 1993: 211; Black 1952; and Unger 1975: 251ff.). The idea that when one asserts that p one represents oneself as knowing that p—call this position ‘RK’—enabled an explanation of certain problem sentences and conversational patterns.

a. Problem Sentences: Moore’s Paradox

G.E. Moore noted the paradoxical nature of asserted conjunctions where one affirms a proposition but also denies that one believes it or that one knows it. Conjunctions such as (1) and (2), he said, sound “absurd” (Moore 1942: 542-43; 1962: 277):

(1) Dogs bark, but I don’t believe that they do.

(2) Dogs bark, but I don’t know that they do.

The order of the conjuncts does not matter to their absurdity, as (3) and (4) make clear (Moore 1993: 207):

(3) I don’t believe that dogs bark, but they do.

(4) I don’t know that [whether] dogs bark, but they do.

What captured Moore’s interest about such asserted sentences is that they could be true and yet it seems incoherent to state that truth: “It is a paradox that it should be perfectly absurd to utter assertively words of which the meaning is something which may quite well be true—is not a contradiction” (Moore 1993: 209). Moore’s own diagnosis of their absurdity appeals to something like RK, namely that “by asserting p positively, you imply, though you don’t assert, that you know that p” (1962: 277). So in asserting one of (1) – (4), one asserts, in one conjunct, a proposition and thereby also represents oneself as knowing it; but one also denies, in the other conjunct, that one knows it (or believes it, entailed by knowing it), thus generating a contradiction between what one claims (that one doesn’t know) and what one represents as being the case (that one does know).

b. Conversational Patterns

Peter Unger (1975) pointed to certain conversational patterns which seem to support RK, because RK well-explains them. One of these concerns the common use of the question “How do you know?” in response to someone’s assertion: such a question may be used to elicit clarification about why one is flat-out asserting, but importantly, it also may be used to challenge someone’s assertion. What is more, it is rare that this question is condemned as out of line in response to an assertion. Such questions are appropriate even though an asserter has said nothing at all about knowing what she’s asserted, and an asserter cannot acceptably answer such questions by claiming that she never claimed that she knew it. And an asserter who concedes with “I don’t know,” or modifies her original assertion by moving to “I believe p” or “I think p” or “Probably p” will normally be taken to be retreating from her original outright assertion that p: she has instead replaced her claim with a weaker one. RK explains all these points (Unger 1975: 263-64; cf. also Slote 1979).

Timothy Williamson (1996; 2000, Ch. 11), provides a fuller defense of the view, and pointed to further conversational patterns explained by RK. Williamson’s account replaces RK with the Knowledge Norm of Assertion, sometimes called the ‘Knowledge Account of Assertion’, which says that

(KNA) One must: assert that p only if one knows that p

KNA can be thought of “as giving the condition on which a speaker has the authority to make an assertion. Thus asserting p without knowing p is doing something without having the authority to do it, like giving someone a command without having the authority to do so” (2000: 257). Williamson thinks of KNA as constitutive of the speech act of assertion, conceived of by analogy with the rules of a game: just as the rules of chess are essential to it in that they constitute what the game is and what it is to play chess, so Williamson thinks of the speech act of assertion as constituted by its relation to KNA. In this sense, mastering the speech act of assertion involves implicitly grasping this norm and the practice which it governs (2000: 241); indeed, the speech act plausibly functions to express one’s knowledge (Turri 2011). If this is correct, KNA would explain RK, a descriptive fact about what speakers who assert represent about themselves: for it is in virtue of engaging in a practice whose norm we all implicitly grasp that one would represent oneself as conforming to that norm. (For helpful discussion of Williamson’s approach to constitutivity, see Turri 2014a; for an account on which the KNA is derived from a more fundamental norm of intellectual flourishing, see Brogaard 2014.)

Williamson notes that in addition to the “How do you know?” question which can be used to implicitly challenge one’s authority to assert, the stronger challenge question “Do you know that?” explicitly challenges one’s authority, and the dismissal “You don’t know that!” rejects one’s authority. KNA explains this range of aggressiveness (Williamson 2000: 253; 2009: 344). Turri (2010) further points out that there is an asymmetry between the acceptability of certain kinds of prompts to assertion:

(5) Do you know whether p?

(6) Is p?

are typically interchangeable as prompts to an assertion, and the flat-out assertion “p” serves to answer each equally well; but certain stronger questions, such as “Are you certain that p?” typically cannot be used, as can (5) and (6), as an initial prompt for assertion, whereas weaker prompts such as “Do you think that p?” or “Do you have any idea whether p?” seem to request something weaker than a flat-out assertion (perhaps a hedged assertion or a prediction), are thereby not interchangeable with (5) and (6). Related to this data is that a standard response when one feels not well-positioned to assert, in reply to a prompt like (6), is to answer “I don’t know.” The appropriateness of the “I don’t know” response is telling given that the query was about p, not about whether one knows that p. Thus KNA seems confirmed by these data.

In addition to prompts and challenges, and our responses to them, there is data from lottery assertions (Williamson 2000: 246-252, Hawthorne 2004: 21-23). Many people find it somehow inappropriate for people to flat-out assert of a particular lottery ticket (before the draw has been announced) that it will lose, even though given a large enough lottery its losing is overwhelmingly probable. Many also find it plausible that one does not know that such a ticket will lose. KNA proponents aim to explain the first point in terms of the second: the reason it is inappropriate for one to make such lottery assertions, absent special knowledge about the lottery being rigged, is that one does not know that the ticket will lose.

Benton (2011) and Blaauw (2012) also point to peculiar facts about the parenthetical positioning of “I know” in assertive sentences, which seem well-explained by KNA. Notice that “I believe” (or “I think,” or “probably”) can occur in assertive constructions to hedge one’s assertion, and syntactically they can occur in prefaced or utterance-initial position (7), parenthetical position (8), or utterance-final parenthetical position (9), with each sounding as good as the other:

(7) I believe that John is in his office.

(8) John is, I believe, in his office.

(9) John is in his office, I believe.

Yet with “I know,” (10) sounds perfectly in order, but (11) and (12), while coherent, can seem oddly redundant:

(10) I know that John is in his office.

(11) ? John is, I know, in his office.

(12) ? John is in his office, I know.

KNA is able to explain why: if flat-out assertions express one’s knowledge, or represent one as knowing, it will be expressively redundant to add to it that one knows (where (10) is not redundant because it seems to be the amplified claim that: one knows that John’s in his office). However this explanatory argument from KNA of such data has been critiqued as incomplete or inadequate (see McKinnon & Turri 2013, McGlynn 2014).

Finally, knowledge seems to be connected to assertion in parallel with its connection to showing someone how to do something: in the same way that knowing that p seems to be required for permissibly asserting that p, knowing how to X seems to be required for permissibly showing someone how to X. In this sense, knowing is the pedagogical norm of showing, for structurally parallel considerations to the linguistic data discussed above (Moorean conjunctions, challenges, prompts, etc.) is available for pedagogical contexts (Buckwalter & Turri 2014).

In short, KNA claims to offer the best explanation of these data from Moorean conjunctions, challenges, prompts, responses to prompts, lottery assertions, parenthetical positioning, and pedagogical norms.

c. Rivals and Objections

Though KNA has been widely defended, its opponents offer substantial criticism and suggest rival accounts requiring other epistemic or alethic conditions: most rival norms of assertion appeal to justified or reasonable or well-supported belief, or that it be reasonable or credible for one to believe, or that one’s assertion be true.

Williamson (2000: 244-249) considered a Truth Norm to be the most significant rival to KNA. Because knowledge is factive, the KNA requires its assertions to be true; but according to the Truth Norm, one must assert that p only if p is true (a further norm requiring evidence for p would be derivable from the requirement of truth), and thus is less demanding than the KNA. Weiner (2005) argues for a Truth Norm by noting that cases of prediction and retrodiction seem to be counterexamples to KNA, that is, they are assertions which seem intuitively acceptable even though the propositions affirmed are not known. Weiner further argues that the Truth Norm can rely on Gricean pragmatic resources to explain the data from lotteries and Moorean conjunctions, for the Truth Norm on its own does not predict the inappropriateness of such assertions. While Weiner (2005) and Whiting (2013) argue for truth as necessary and sufficient for the epistemic propriety of assertion, Littlejohn (2012) and Turri (2013b) argue (compatibly with the KNA) that truth is necessary for epistemically proper assertion; Littlejohn’s defense of factivity focuses on the requirement that assertions about what a subject ought to do would have to satisfy the truth requirement to be properly asserted, whereas Turri’s draws on experimental investigation of people’s judgments of false assertions. For criticisms of Weiner’s Truth Norm, see Pelling (2011) and Benton (2012). A related norm is that proposed by Maitra and Weatherson (2010): they argue that a certain class of statements, namely those concerned with what is “the thing for one to do,” form an important exception to the KNA. Their rival norm, the Action Rule, says “Assert that p only if acting as if p is true is the thing for you to do” (2010: 114). They argue that their Action Rule collapses into the Truth Norm for propositions concerning what one should do (“if an agent should do X, then that agent is in a position to say that they should do X,” 2010: 100), though it does not do so for other propositions.

Douven (2006) argues for a Rational Credibility Norm, and Lackey (2007) argues for a Reasonable-to-Believe Norm; for related norms, see also McKinnon’s (2013) Supportive Reasons Norm. These views roughly hold that to be epistemically acceptable, an assertion that p need not be known, but must be credible or reasonable for the speaker to believe, even if it is not actually believed by the speaker. Douven’s approach argues that his norm is as adequate as the KNA in explaining most of the linguistic data canvassed above, but that his Rational Credibility norm is a priori simpler than, and so preferable to, the KNA (cf. Douven 2009 which updates some of his arguments). Lackey’s influential discussion argues for this view by suggesting that cases of selfless assertion are intuitively acceptable. Selfless assertions involve cases in which an asserter possesses knowledge-worthy evidence, appreciates the strength of that evidence, yet for non-epistemic reasons fails to believe that p (and asserts that p anyway). Thus on Lackey’s particular account, the speaker need not even believe what is asserted (for criticism of Lackey’s view, see Turri 2014b). Because these norms sanction lottery assertions and Moorean assertions, Douven and Lackey both attempt to explain away the impropriety attending to such assertions.

Kvanvig (2009, 2011a) argues for a Justified Belief Norm; somewhat related is Neta’s (2009) Justified-Belief-that-One-Knows Norm. These norms require, for permissible assertion, a justified belief of some kind, either that the asserter justifiably believe what is asserted, perhaps even knowledge-level justification; or that the asserter hold the higher order justified belief that she knows what she’s asserted (the latter of which will, on many views, itself require that she justifiably believe the asserted proposition). These norms do not actually require an assertion to be true, and thus their proponents have to explain the apparent defect in a false assertion, even if one is largely absolved from blame given that that one was justified in believing what was asserted (for discussion see Williamson 2009: 345). Similarly, Coffman (2014) argues for a Would-Be Knowledge Norm, which is stronger than a justified belief norm in that it requires not only knowledge-level justification, but also that the belief not be Gettiered. This norm also, however, does not require truth, for one might have a false belief which (given one’s knowledge-level justification) would be knowledge if only it were true.

Another rival approach is a context-sensitive norm of assertion which accepts that an epistemic norm governs assertion, but claims that its content can vary according to context. There are different ways of formulating such an account. On Gerken’s (2012) view, the epistemic norm of a central type of assertion is an internalist norm of “Discursive Justification,” according to which an asserter must be able to articulate reasons for her belief in the proposition asserted. This approach is context-sensitive in that what counts as adequate reason-giving will vary according to context (for other norms of assertion that impose primarily ‘down stream’ requirements on the speaker, see also Rescorla 2009 and MacFarlane 2009: 90ff.).

Goldberg (2009, 2011) initially applied the KNA to issues in the epistemology of testimony. More recently, Goldberg (2015) formulates and defends a context-sensitive norm on which knowledge is often required for permissible assertion—perhaps knowledge is even the default value—but in other contexts justification or reasonable belief might be enough, and in still other contexts, perhaps something even stronger than knowledge is required (certainty, perhaps). Goldberg draws on Grice’s (1989) maxim of quality, according to which assertions are governed by the first supermaxim and its two submaxims:

Quality: Try to make your contribution one that is true.

Do not say that which you believe to be false.
Do not say that for which you lack adequate evidence. (1989, 27)

Grice’s quality maxim, invoking as it does the notion of ‘adequate’ evidence, would seem to be just such a context-sensitive norm (though see Benton 2014a, for reasons to doubt this). Goldberg’s hypothesis is that there is Mutually-Manifest Epistemic Norm of Assertion (MMENA), which is comprised of a norm (ENA), and the context-sensitive mechanism (RMBS) which fixes the epistemic condition required by ENA:

ENA S must: assert p, only if S satisfies epistemic condition E with respect to p, i.e., only if S has the relevant warranting authority regarding p.

RMBS When it comes to a particular assertion that p, the relevant warranting authority regarding p depends in part on what it would be reasonable for all parties to believe is mutually believed among them (regarding such things as the participants’ interests and informational needs, and the prospects for high-quality information in the domain in question) (Goldberg, 2015, Chap. 12)

McKinnon’s (2013) Supportive Reasons Norm is designed to be similarly context-sensitive, and on a natural reading, Lackey’s Reasonable-to-Believe Norm can be understood this way as well; Stone (2007: 100-101) also prefers, but does not develop, a kind of context-sensitive norm opposed to the KNA. Such rival norms have the intuitive benefit of explaining a great range of conversational contexts in which we seem to assert acceptably; however with this flexibility comes the burden of having to provide plausible explanations of the data, considered in sections I.A and I.B above, which invoke knowledge.

Note however that opting for a context-sensitive norm need not mean that one eschews the KNA. DeRose (2002; 2009 Chap. 3) accepts a version of KNA, but regards “know(s)” as semantically context-sensitive. Thus the standard for the truth of “knowledge” ascriptions at a context sets the standard for permissible assertion: for a given speaker S in a conversational context C, the truth conditions for “S knows that p” at C are the assertibility conditions for S to assert that p in C. On this view, knowledge remains the norm of assertion. Relatedly, Schaffer (2008) argues for a contextualist version of KNA which he claims supports contrastivism about knowledge.

Many of the rival norms to KNA are motivated in part by the idea that KNA is just too strong an epistemic requirement on assertion: many KNA opponents find it implausible to think that one has done anything wrong by asserting what one doesn’t know, so long as one’s assertion, or one’s decision to assert p, is supported in the relevant way by adequate evidence or reasons for p (see McGlynn 2014 for a thorough discussion). Some of these objections to KNA come from appeals to intuitions about cases, in particular, cases in which one asserts with strong grounds or evidence, but one is in a Gettier situation, or what one asserts is unluckily false. In general, such cases appeal to what are judged to be blameless assertion (for concerns about relying on such judgments of blame, see Turri & Blouw 2014). Some proponents of KNA respond that in such cases one asserts reasonably if one reasonably took oneself to know, even though on KNA, one still asserts impermissibly: its being reasonable is what excuses one for having violated the norm, and the plausibility of calling it an ‘excuse’ suggests that a norm was violated (Williamson 2000: 256; DeRose 2009: 93-95, Sutton 2007: 80, Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 573, 586); but this excuse maneuver has been heavily criticized for multiplying senses of propriety or for being too general (Lackey 2007, Gerken 2011, Kvanvig 2011a). See also Littlejohn 2012 and 2014 for extensive discussion of the notion of excuse, as related to these norms.

Other opponents of the KNA are particularly motivated to preserve the acceptability of our assertive practices within special contexts which are nevertheless familiar and ones in which it seems that we do assert, such as the philosophy seminar room (see Goldberg, 2015). Still others rely on intuitions about cases and a desire to give a normative role to the hearer of an assertion (see Pelling’s 2013b “knowledge provision” account). Some express skepticism at the very idea of there being a constitutive epistemic norm of assertion in Williamson’s sense, preferring instead the idea that more general norms of cooperation and rationality (perhaps those given by Grice) will suffice to explain any normativity in our practice of saying and asserting (e.g. Cappelen 2011; see Benton, 2014a, and Montgomery 2014 for discussion). Maitra (2011) in particular presents a challenge to Williamson’s way of formulating the notion of constitutive rules on analogy with the rules of a game. Yet the general idea that a constitutive epistemic norm can individuate speech acts has been deployed for other speech acts on the assertive spectrum: Turri (2013) thereby individuates the stronger speech act of guaranteeing, and Benton & Turri (2014) individuate the speech act of prediction.

The final rival to the KNA considered here is a Certainty Norm (Stanley 2008), on which to assert that p one must be (subjectively) certain that p. This norm is motivated in part by the idea that the Moorean conjunction schemas

(13) p but I’m not certain that p

(14) p but it is not certain that p

strike many to be just as problematic as the knowledge and belief conjunctions (1)-(4) considered above; a Certainty Norm could explain them, and if certainty is required for knowledge, it could also explain (1)-(4). However, the Certainty Norm inherits the ‘too strong’ objection with which many charge KNA, and as noted above, certainty does not figure in both prompts and challenges to assertions (Turri 2010). Also, it is unclear how the Certainty Norm will handle the truth desideratum insofar as conversational participants generally seem to care about truth, and not just a speaker’s confidence, in assertion.

d. Sufficiency

Even if KNA can seem to impose an overly demanding condition on the propriety of assertion, on first pass it might seem that knowledge at least provides a sufficient condition on epistemically permissible assertion. After all, this idea goes, even if some epistemic/alethic standard weaker than knowledge is necessary for permissible assertion, nevertheless surely having knowledge is sufficient. Most of the rivals to KNA ought to agree that when one knows, one thereby arguably meets the less stringent standards of: truth, it being reasonable/credible to believe, being justified in believing, and (if the contextually set standards for certainty do not easily come apart from those of knowledge) being certain enough to assert. Thus some of KNA’s defenders (cf. Hawthorne 2004: 23 n. 58, and 87; DeRose 2009: 93), and many of its opponents, could be tempted to endorse a sufficiency direction of the knowledge norm, such as the following:

(KNA-S) One is properly epistemically positioned to assert that p if one knows that p.

(As shall be seen below in section 2.c, similar sufficiency principles, tying knowledge to action, undergird pragmatic encroachment views of knowledge.)

But Lackey (2011, 2013) has argued that in fact, KNA-S is false (compare Pelling 2013a for another argument). She appeals to cases of what she calls isolated second-hand knowledge to show that in some settings, particularly those involving experts, asserting even though one knows is epistemically deficient. Consider a case in which an oncologist has referred her patient for lab tests, which arrive back on her day off. She must meet with the patient to provide the diagnosis, if any, and is only able to confer briefly with the oncologist from the lab about what the diagnosis is (that he has pancreatic cancer). The doctor can learn from her colleague’s testimony that her patient has pancreatic cancer, but this knowledge is isolated (she knows no other facts about the test results or the diagnosis), and entirely second-hand (via testimony with the lab oncologist). Given her epistemic situation, Lackey argues, it is intuitively (epistemically) impermissible for the doctor to assert to her patient that he has pancreatic cancer, even though she knows this. More generally, for experts asserting as experts, it seems that asserting with merely isolated second-hand knowledge is (epistemically) improper, because experts ought to engage their expertise first-hand, or ought to have more than isolated knowledge gained entirely through expert testimony. Thus Lackey argues that KNA-S is false. (See Carter & Gordon 2011 for an appeal to the idea that understanding is needed. For a challenge to Lackey’s cases, see Benton 2014b; for her reply, see Lackey 2014.)

2. Knowledge Norm of Action

Knowledge seems intimately connected to our reasons for, and our evaluations of, action. Recently many philosophers have endorsed normative connections between knowledge and action, and have deployed principles according to which knowledge is either necessary, sufficient, or both necessary and sufficient for appropriate action. Some of these discussions are focused on action as the result of practical reasoning, or on the connection between knowledge and reasons, or on knowledge as a sufficient epistemic position for acting on a proposition. We will consider these in turn.

a. Knowledge and Practical Reasoning

Some philosophers have noticed intuitive connections between knowledge, assertion, and practical reasoning (see Fantl & McGrath 2002; Hawthorne 2004, esp. 21-32, and Ch. 4; Stanley 2005; and Hawthorne & Stanley 2008). Many thus argue that knowledge plays an important normative role in practical reasoning: when one faces a decision over whether to act that depends on the truth of some proposition, then acting without knowing that proposition can seem epistemically suspect and deserving of criticism. We often invoke knowledge when justifying someone’s decision to act, and we often cite their lack of knowledge when censuring others for acting on inadequate grounds; knowledge figures in our appraisals of blame, negligence, and in conditional orders wherein one is commanded to X just in case one knows a specified condition to obtain.

These facts support the idea that one ought only to use known propositions as premises in one’s practical deliberations. For example, if you opt against purchasing very affordable health insurance, on the grounds that you are plenty healthy, you may be criticized by your loved ones precisely because you do not know that you will not soon fall gravely ill. To take another example: suppose that you spent a dollar on a lottery ticket in a 10,000 ticket lottery with a $5,000 prize, and you are deliberating about whether to sell your ticket. Suppose you reason as follows:

The ticket is a loser.

So if I keep the ticket, I will get nothing.

But if I sell the ticket, I will get a penny.

So I should sell the ticket. (Hawthorne 2004: 29, 85)

Such reasoning should strike us as unacceptable and a plausible reason for why is that the first premise isn’t known. Similarly, suppose that someone offered to sell you their ticket in the same lottery for a cent: if you decline on the basis that you know their ticket will lose, that may also strike us as the wrong basis for declining, for it seems (to many) that you don’t know the ticket will lose. Indeed, if you do know the first premise, standard decision theory validates the reasoning; this suggests that only one’s beliefs which amount to knowledge should figure in to shaping one’s decision table (cf. Weatherson 2012).

These kinds of considerations suggest the following necessary direction norm, Action-Knowledge Principle (AKP), which gives a necessary condition on appropriately treating a proposition as a reason for acting:

(AKP) Treat the proposition that p as a reason for acting only if you know that p (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 578)

AKP plausibly lies behind our epistemic evaluations of actions, and also provides a nice diagnosis of some comparative intuitions about low stakes vs. high stakes cases (e.g. Stanley 2005, 9-10).

A parallel debate concerns the idea that there is a common epistemic norm—say, knowledge, or perhaps epistemic ‘warrant,’ or justification—which provides a necessary condition on both appropriate assertion in particular and appropriate action/practical reasoning more generally: see Brown 2011 and 2012, Montminy 2013, Gerken 2013. As we will see in the next section, a structurally similar question concerns whether a common epistemic norm governs practical reason as well as theoretical reason (that is, on what one can appropriately take as a reason for believing).

Some important criticisms of AKP are the following. First, as with the KNA above, it doesn’t license acting on p when one holds a justified belief that p; indeed, one might be Gettiered with respect to p (see Brown 2008, Neta 2009). Acting on p in such cases seems to many to be entirely appropriate, and thus these are counterexamples to AKP. As with the KNA, the reply (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 573-74, 586) is that such subjects are blameless for making an excusable mistake, and the need for an excuse is explained by AKP.

Second, it has been objected that AKP doesn’t license acting on subjective probabilities of a proposition, and thus that it can seem in conflict with Bayesian decision theory. Sometimes one is only in a position to treat propositions that are probable for one as reasons for acting; Cresto (2010) argues that when probabilistic talk is interpreted in subjectivist terms, AKP can be violated even though it seems as though one has done nothing wrong. On standard Bayesian decision theory, one plugs one’s probabilities, along with one’s values for possible outcomes, into one’s decision table to discern the act which maximizes expected utility. If you assign 0.7 probability to (have 0.7 credence in) the proposition that it will rain, and on that basis choose to carry an umbrella on your walk, have you violated AKP? Perhaps not, for if you know that you assign 0.7 probability to it raining, and use this knowledge as your reason for acting, then you do not violate AKP: the proposition that you treat as your reason for so acting is that rain is 0.7 probable (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 580-583). Arguably, one’s credences are not always luminous to one, and thus there is still a role for knowledge (and thus AKP) to play. Weatherson (2012) argues that the role for knowledge in decision theory is that it sets the standard for what gets on to one’s decision table; moreover, it might be that one’s credences can constitute knowledge (Moss 2013), and if so there is room for AKP to govern actions based on them. But still, it might be implausible to suppose that every such case of appropriately acting on a probability involves your knowing what your credence is: though your credence in it may be 0.7 on this occasion, this may not be transparent to you. It may be sufficient for you to act on the more coarse-grained probability that it’s more likely than not that it will rain, even if you do not form the belief that it is more likely than not that will rain. On this way of looking at things, the objection remains. For important constructive work adjudicating these issues and proposing some ways in which a knowledge norm for practical reasoning and Bayesian decision theory are compatible, see Weisberg (2013).

b. Knowledge and Reasons

We standardly cite reasons as propositions which ought to make a difference to someone’s decision to act one way or another. Such normative reasons are reasons there are for a particular agent to believe, feel, or act a certain way. (Such reasons are distinguishable from both explanatory reasons—reasons why an agent believed or felt or acted—and from motivating reasons—reasons for which an agent acted in a particular way.) Normative reasons can be either possessed by an agent or not possessed by an agent: if Iris is at the bar and there is petrol in the glass in front of her, then there is a reason for her not to drink the liquid in her glass, but it will not be a reason Iris possesses unless she is aware that there is petrol in the glass.

A natural way to approach the connection between knowledge and action is by noting that possessing a reason for some action arguably depends on knowing a proposition, and that lacking knowledge can rob one of possessing the relevant reason (see Hyman 1999, Unger 1975, Ch. 5, Alvarez 2010, and Littlejohn 2014). If Iris knows that there is petrol in the glass, then that is a reason she possesses to refrain from drinking it; but if she does not know it, then she does not possess that reason to refrain, even though there is a reason for her to refrain. There being petrol in the glass can only be a reason Iris possesses if she knows it.

This view connects naturally with the above discussion of the normative relation between knowledge and action: where one treats a proposition as one’s reason for action, and then acts for that reason, one only acts properly when one knows that proposition. This is because, on the view being considered, one cannot possess p as a reason to ϕ unless one knows that p. Of course, one’s motivating reason for ϕ-ing might be a falsehood: one might falsely believe that q and thereby take q as one’s reason for ϕ-ing, and one’s belief that q explains why one ϕ’d. On the view being considered then, one cannot in that circumstance have had q as a reason, for one cannot (because q is false) know that q. That is, the reasons one takes to be one’s reasons can come apart from the reasons one in fact possesses. If this is correct, it has consequences for how to understand the normative concept of justification. In particular, knowledge figures importantly in understanding what reasons justify one in believing or in acting, such that the mark of justification is not an internalist or subjectivist notion of rationality but instead an externalist or objectivist notion explicable in terms of facts or knowledge of facts. See Littlejohn (2014) for more.

Some philosophers question the claim, crucial to the above line of reasoning, that one can possess p as a reason, or properly treat p as a reason for acting, only if p is true (and known). Comesaña and McGrath (2014) call this “factualism about reasons-had,” and against it they argue that one can have false reasons (see also Schroeder 2008, Fantl & McGrath 2009: 100-104, and Dancy 2014, among others). The case for the possibility of having false reasons is built primarily upon two ideas. First, it seems to them that ascribing a reason to someone for their action can be done even if that reason is (or entails) a false proposition. That is, they claim that one could acceptably say of someone that “The reason she turned down the job was that she had another job offer,” even if she did not have another job offer and the speaker knows this. Second, when someone acts on a mistaken belief, there is pressure to claim that she acted for the same reason as she would’ve had her belief in fact been true. On this way of looking at things, there must be the same psychological state that rationalizes Iris’s taking and drinking from the glass with petrol in it as would (counterfactually) rationalize Iris’s taking and drinking from a glass with gin and tonic in it; in other words, such views take what it is that rationalizes to be what it is that provides ones with reasons, both motivating and normative: one has the same normative reasons in both the good and bad cases. Such views are at odds with the standard semantics about schemas such as “S’s reason for X-ing was/is that p” or “The reason S had for X-ing was that p”, which entail that p and so are factive; see Comesaña and McGrath (2014) for ways of handling these semantic issues.

As noted in the last section, there is a parallel question about whether the epistemic norm governing practical reason is the same as that governing theoretical reason. Hawthorne & Stanley’s AKP is a knowledge norm on practical reason, but they also note the analogous principle regarding reasons for belief:

(TKP) Treat the proposition that p as a reason for believing q only if one knows that p. (2008, 577)

Littlejohn (2014) notes a compelling argument that AKP is true just in case TKP, and that more generally, whatever epistemic status norms practical reason must also norm theoretical reason. The argument for it goes thus. Suppose (for reductio) that in fact, the norm for theoretical reason were less epistemically demanding than that for practical reason: for concreteness, suppose that one could treat p as a reason for believing that q only if one were justified in believing that p, but that knowledge still governed practical reason along the lines suggested by AKP. In that case, if you justifiably believe that this liquid is gin, and you knew that you ought (if you can) to make another round of drinks for your guests, you could take your justified belief that it is gin as your reason for believing that: you can make them another round of drinks. But AKP says that you may treat that latter proposition (that you can make them another round of drinks) as a reason only if you know it; and let’s suppose you don’t know it, because in fact it’s not gin but petrol. In this situation, though it’s proper for you to treat your justified belief as a reason to form another belief, AKP says that you cannot properly treat this new belief as a reason for acting, namely making another round of drinks. If the epistemic norms diverged in this way, they would “demand that you were akratic,” and this seems absurd (Littlejohn 2014: 135-136). Things go similarly if the divergence goes the other way, namely if the norm of theoretical reason were more demanding than the norm of action: together these would permit situations in which one can act on a proposition (say, because one justifiably believes it), but not use it as a premise from which to deduce, and form beliefs in, other propositions. Thus there is a case for the unity thesis that a single epistemic status governs both practical and theoretical reasoning, even if it is not knowledge; for arguments that it is something weaker than knowledge, like justification or warrant, see Gerken (2011).

c. Sufficiency and Pragmatic Encroachment

Though Fantl & McGrath question the necessary direction principles AKP, they and others do endorse and defend sufficiency direction principles on which knowledge of a proposition is sufficient to rationalize acting on that proposition. Hawthorne & Stanley (2008, 578) defend a biconditional principle which adds to AKP a sufficiency direction, given a choice one faces which depends on a particular proposition. Where a choice between options X1… Xn is “p-dependent” just in case the most preferable of X1… Xn conditional on the proposition that p is not the same as the most preferable of X1… Xn conditional on the proposition that not-p, the Reason-Knowledge Principle (RKP) says:

(RKP) Where one’s choice is p-dependent, it is appropriate to treat the proposition that p as a reason for acting just in case one knows that p.

RKP gives necessary and sufficient conditions for appropriately treating a proposition as a reason for acting. Similarly Fantl & McGrath (2002, 2009, 2012) defend at length a variety of sufficiency conditions tying knowledge to action:

(Action) If you know that p, then if the question of whether p is relevant to the question of what to do, it is proper for you to act on p.

(Preference) If you know that p, then you are rational to prefer as if p.

(Inquiry) If you know that p, then you are proper not to inquire further into whether p.

(KJ) If you know that p, then p is warranted enough to justify you in ϕ-ing, for any ϕ.

On the face of them, these principles can seem exactly right: for example, it might seem obvious that if one knows a proposition, then one is in good enough position to act upon it. But these principles admit of modus tollens as well: if it is not proper for one to act on p, or rational to prefer as if p, or proper to close off inquiry regarding p, or where p is not warranted to enough for one to act, for any action one considers undertaking, then one does not know that p. These principles bear out the intuitive judgments of many about such cases: to the extent that one’s epistemic position in some p seems inadequate when facing a decision that depends on that p, to that same extent we tend to be inclined to deny that one knows that p. That is, in cases where the practical stakes for one make it irrational for one to act on a proposition, such principles entail that one does not know that proposition (even though in other contexts where one faces no such decision, where one has the same evidence or is in the same “epistemic” position, one might know that proposition). Thus such views endorse “pragmatic encroachment” in epistemology (also known as “subject-sensitive invariantism” in Hawthorne 2004: Ch. 4, Brown 2008, and DeRose 2009), for practical considerations can seem to encroach on whether one knows. See Neta 2009 and Kvanvig 2011b for some criticisms, and Fantl & McGrath 2012 for arguments that pragmatic encroachment isn’t only about knowledge.

3. Knowledge Norm of Belief

a. The Belief-Assertion Parallel

Some philosophers (going back to at least Frege, Peirce, and Ramsey) find plausible the idea that belief or judgment amount to a kind of “inner assertion” where (full) belief is the inner analogue to outward (flat-out) assertion. For those inclined to this view who also accept the Knowledge Norm of Assertion, there is a motivation to accept a parallel Knowledge Norm of Belief. Williamson gestures at this idea thus:

It is plausible, nevertheless, that occurrently believing p stands to asserting p as the inner stands to the outer. If so, the knowledge rule for assertion corresponds to the norm that one should believe p only if one knows p. Given that norm, it is not reasonable to believe p when one knows that one does not know p. (2000, 255-56)

Adler (2002: 276ff.) calls this idea the “Belief-Assertion Parallel,” and offers a range of considerations suggesting that belief and assertion are on a par in this way.

Note however, that this Parallel is likewise intuitive should one prefer some kind of evidential or justification norm, rather than a knowledge norm, on both assertion and on belief. If, epistemically speaking, one shouldn’t assert to others that p without some sufficient evidence or justification for p, then one shouldn’t (epistemically speaking) believe that p without some similar sufficient evidence or justification for p; and in reverse, if (epistemically speaking) one shouldn’t believe that p without some sufficient evidence or justification for p, then one shouldn’t (epistemically speaking) assert to others that p without some similar sufficient evidence or justification for p. Thus to the extent that one finds the epistemic standard for assertion to be similar, if not identical, to the epistemic standard for belief, to that extent the Belief-Assertion Parallel will seem intuitive. Only if one takes the standard for one to be higher than the standard for the other will one be motivated to reject the Belief-Assertion Parallel. (For in-depth discussion, see Goldberg 2015, Chs. 6 and 7.)

Though Williamson does not formulate it explicitly, taking a cue from his KNA schema would provide us with a similar formulation for a Knowledge Norm of Belief, which gives a necessary condition for the propriety of belief:

(KNB) One must: believe p only if one knows p.

(Compare Sutton 2005, 2007; for clarification of how best to understand a norm like KNB, see Jackson 2012.) In addition to the inner/outer parallel noted above, Williamson also provides a different consideration in favor of KNB, one that invokes teleological considerations concerning the “aim” of belief:

If believing p is, roughly, treating p as if one knew p, then knowing is in that sense central to believing. Knowledge sets the standard of appropriateness for belief. That does not imply that all cases of knowing are paradigmatic cases of believing, for one might know p while in a sense treating p as if one did not know p—that is, while treating p in ways untypical of those in which subjects treat what they know. Nevertheless, as a crude generalization, the further one is from knowing p, the less appropriate it is to believe p. Knowing is in that sense the best kind of believing. Mere believing is a kind of botched knowing. In short, belief aims at knowledge (not just truth). (Williamson 2000, 47)

Notice that the KNB provides an elegant and unified account of Moore’s Paradox at the level of belief, a desideratum of many approaches to theorizing about Moore’s Paradox (e.g. Sorenson 1988): these authors note that while the sentences (1)-(4), uttered assertively, are absurd, it also seems absurd to believe (the propositions of) any of their conjuncts together. Huemer (2007) argues explicitly for the idea that theorizing about Moorean conjunctions in this way should lead us to accept both KNA and KNB.

Sosa (2010/2011, Chap. 3: 41-53) provides an interesting argument for another version of the Belief-Assertion Parallel, which arrives at norms similar to KNA and KNB, but he does so by explicit appeal to teleological considerations about the aim of belief. Sosa argues for what he calls the Affirmative Conception of Belief (2011: 41; cf. Sosa 2014):

Consider a concept of affirming that p, defined as: concerning the proposition that p, either (a) asserting it publicly, or (b) assenting to it privately.

With this Affirmative Conception in hand, he then applies considerations from the propriety of means-end action in general to the action of assertion as a special case, using the terminology of his virtue-theoretic epistemology (cf. Sosa 2007):

If one asserts that p as means thereby to assert that p with truth, this essentially involves the relevant means-end belief. I mean the belief that asserting that p is a means to thereby assert that p with truth. And this belief is equivalent to the belief that p. Accordingly, if that means-end belief needs to amount to knowledge in order for the means-end action to be apt, then in order for a sincere assertion that p to be apt, the agent must know that p. In this way, knowledge is a norm of assertion. If an assertion (in one’s own person) that p is not to fall short epistemically it must be sincere, and a sincere assertion that p will be apt only if the subject knows that p. This is, moreover, not just a norm in the sense that the subject does better in his assertion that p provided he knows that p. Rather, if his assertion is not apt, it then fails to meet minimum standards of performance normativity. Any performance (with an aim) that is inapt is thereby flawed. … Knowledge is said to be necessary for proper assertion … If knowledge is the norm of assertion, it is plausibly also the norm of affirmation, whether the affirming be private or public. (2011: 48)

Sosa goes on to develop an intriguing argument for the “equivalence” of the knowledge norm of assertion and the value-of-knowledge thesis (2011: 49-52). For a related view tying the norms of belief and assertion to a virtue-theoretic account, see Wright (2014).

Instructive here is Bach’s combination of views (Bach & Harnisch 1979, Bach 2008). Bach holds a Belief Norm of Assertion, on which the only norm fundamental to assertion is that assertions must be sincere (one must outright believe what one flat-out asserts), but he also holds a Knowledge Norm of Belief much like KNB (2008: 77). Because Bach accepts the KNB, he gets a derived version of the KNA: for one must believe only what one knows, but given his Belief Norm of Assertion, one must assert only what one believes; thus one must assert only what one knows, if one is believing as one ought. This combination of views is one which accepts KNB, accepts (the derivative) KNA, but which denies the Belief-Assertion Parallel at the level of what norms are constitutive of assertion and of belief.

An objection to the KNB, similar in spirit to objections to KNA considered above, is that many find it implausible to hold that one is doing epistemically poorly, or doing anything epistemically impermissible, by believing many propositions which we nevertheless do not know, and which we furthermore properly take ourselves not to know. For some important criticisms of KNB, stemming from arguments that there is nothing epistemically problematic or improper about lottery propositions, see McGlynn (2013, 2014). Relatedly, while most find it incoherent or irrational to believe the Moorean conjunction form (1) considered above, many find it unproblematic to believe some conjunctions of the form (2), namely believing a proposition and also believing that one does not know that proposition. Those who object to KNB on these grounds tend to deny a parallel between the epistemic standard for belief and the epistemic standard for knowledge. Couched in evidential terminology, many epistemologists intuitively think of belief in terms of an evidence-threshold model, according to which the evidential threshold which one must meet in order permissibly belief some proposition is lower than the evidential threshold for knowledge: more evidence is required to know than to (permissibly) believe.

b. Knowledge Disagreement Norm

In a spirit related to considerations stemming from endorsement of the KNB, Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013) argue for a Knowledge Norm of Disagreement. In the growing literature on the epistemology of disagreement, debate ensues over what one should do in the face of disagreement about some proposition, particularly when those disagreeing with one are regarded as one’s intellectual or evidential peers. Typically such cases of peer disagreement are formulated such that you have formed a belief or a judgment on (or assigned a credence to) some proposition p, and have done so on the basis of some evidence: perhaps it is a judgment about which of two horses won a very close race, and the evidence is visual; or perhaps it is a judgment about what you and your friend each owe from calculating your share of a restaurant bill which you are splitting, in which case the evidence is intellectual and inferential. Many philosophers writing on such cases of disagreement are “conciliationists” of one sort or another, that is, they endorse the idea that in some such disagreements, one does something improper or irrational if one does not either suspend judgment on p, or reduce one’s credence in p. Opposed to conciliationists are “dogmatists” who advocate the idea that in face of such disagreements, it is sometimes appropriate or rational for one to hold steadfast or “stick to one’s guns” by retaining one’s belief or one’s credence. (See essays in Feldman & Warfield 2010, and Christensen & Lackey 2013 for more.)

Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013: 11-12), drawing on a knowledge-centric epistemology which takes knowledge to be the central goal of our epistemic activity, articulate a position which is in some ways a middle ground between these two views. They argue for the following Knowledge Disagreement Norm:

(KDN) In a case of disagreement about whether p, where S believes that p and H believes that not-p:

(i) S ought to trust H and believe that not-p iff were S to trust H, this would result in S’s knowing not-p

(ii) S ought to dismiss H and continue to believe that p iff were S to stick to her guns this would result in S’s knowing p, and

(iii) in all other cases, S ought to suspend judgment about whether p.

KDN’s ‘ought’ clauses are motivated by a ranking of actions according to their counterfactual outcomes: according to KDN’s clause (i), one should be ‘conciliatory’ in the face of disagreement just in case trusting one’s disagreeing interlocutor would result in one gaining knowledge, whereas according to clause (ii), one should be ‘dogmatic’ in the face of disagreement just in case would lead to retaining one’s knowledge. Finally, in cases where neither party knows whether the proposition under dispute is true, each should suspend judgment.

Notice that KDN, formulated in the terminology of knowledge and outright belief, is neutral on the matter of how to respond when the ‘disagreement’ concerns divergences in credences toward a proposition: its clause (iii) is capable of accommodating many different approaches here. Further, KDN is fully general in that it does not hold only for cases of peer disagreement: its clauses (i) and (ii) are designed to capture the appropriateness of occasions in which someone defers to an expert or someone in a better evidential position, and thereby can come to know by trusting them. If it is plausible to suppose that becoming apprised of peer disagreement can defeat one’s knowledge, then such cases may be subsumed to clause (iii) (2013: 13-14, 21ff). Finally, KDN has the merit that, if followed, knowledge will tend to be maximized for all parties to a disagreement: if we disagree, but by trusting you, I can come to know what you believe, I ought to do so.

It may be objected that KDN is not easily followed, precisely because knowledge is a non-luminous condition, that is, one is not always in a position to know when one knows; and this is particularly pressing in the case of disagreement, for it is clear that (at least) one of the disagreeing parties doesn’t know, and it can be utterly unclear to most such disputants which one (if any) knows. This objection, and similar objections that are occasionally pressed against the norms of assertion and practical reasoning covered in earlier sections, seems to assume that norms must be perfectly operationalizable, that is, they must be such that one is always in a position to know whether one is complying with them (Williamson 2008). On this idea, a norm N, which requires that one X in circumstances C, will be perfectly operationalizable just in case S can know she is in C, and is thus in a position to reason that, given that she is in C, and could X by A-ing, and that N says she ought to X in C, that S ought to A. But it is a substantive question whether norms are or must be perfectly operationalizable; and given that many such conditions of epistemological interest are arguably non-luminous (see Williamson 2000: Ch. 4), one might reconsider the worth of that assumption. For more discussion of this issue and how it relates to the hypological categories of praise and blame, see Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013: 15-21).

4. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Matthew A. Benton
Email: matthew.benton@philosophy.ox.ac.uk
University of Oxford
United Kingdom

Legal Validity

Legal validity governs the enforceability of law, and the standard of legal validity enhances or restricts the ability of the political ruler to enforce his will through legal coercion. Western law adopts three competing standards of legal validity. Each standard emphasizes a different dimension of law (Berman 1988, p. 779), and each has its own school of jurisprudence.

Legal positivism emphasizes law’s political dimension. Legal positivism recognizes political rulers as the only source of valid law and adopts the will of the political ruler as its validity standard. Leading legal positivists include Jeremy Bentham, John Austin, and H.L.A. Hart.

Natural law theory emphasizes law’s moral dimension. Natural law theory recognizes universal moral principles as the primary source of valid law. These moral principles provide a standard of legal validity that imposes moral limits on the ruler’s coercive powers. Leading natural law theorists include Aristotle, Cicero, Justinian, and Thomas Aquinas.

The historicist school emphasizes law’s historical dimension. The historicist school recognizes legal custom as the primary source of valid law. Legal custom provides a standard of legal validity that imposes customary limits on the political ruler’s coercive powers. Leading historicists include Sir Edward Coke, John Selden, Sir Matthew Hale, and Sir William Blackstone.

Legal positivism recognizes positive law as the only real law and rejects law’s moral and historical dimensions as sources of valid laws. Natural law theory and the historicist school, on the other hand, often integrate law’s three dimensions. They recognize each dimension as a potential source of valid law but emphasize a particular dimension through their validity standard. Blackstone’s unique jurisprudence adopts two validity standards, one from law’s historical dimension, and one from law’s moral dimension.

Standards of legal validity are historically cyclical. A society typically adopts a standard of legal validity based on moral principles, custom, or both. This validity standard restricts the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion. Then, intellectual challenges to moral principles and legal custom minimize their esteem. A new validity standard is adopted based on the will of the political ruler. Abuses of coercive powers by political rulers eventually stimulate renewed restrictions on those powers. The society adopts a revived standard of legal validity based on moral principles, custom, or both. The revived validity standard will typically endure until the memory of abuse fades, when the cycle begins again.

This cycle began with Hesiod in 700 B. C. E. and continued into the 21st Century. In common law jurisprudence, judicial acceptance of Hart’s legal positivism eroded Blackstone’s validity standards based on moral principles and custom. In civil law jurisprudence, Soviet and Nazi abuses of positivist legal systems revived validity standards based on moral principles. This essay describes the cycle of legal validity in Western law and proposes a fresh approach to legal validity to break this cycle.

The Sophists
Plato
Aristotle
Cicero
Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis
Aquinas
Blackstone
Bentham
Austin
Hart
Radbruch
Positivism in American Jurisprudence
A Fresh Approach
References and Further Reading

1. The Sophists

The first standard of legal validity in the Western legal tradition appears in Hesiod’s religious poem Works and Days, circa 700 B. C. E. Hesiod presents an archetypal jurisprudence that integrates law’s three dimensions. Dikê, the goddess of human justice, personifies law’s moral dimension. Dikê’s father Zeus personifies law’s political dimension. Dikê’s mother Thetis, the Titan embodiment of custom and social order, personifies law’s historical dimension.

Justice “sets the laws straight with righteousness” and distinguishes men from beasts. Divinely decreed moral principles establish the validity standard for human law and customs, and conforming laws and customs establish the nomoi (law). Just men obey the nomoi, and obedience brings peace and prosperity. Disobedience brings punishment to the individual and his city through famine, plague, infertility, and military disaster.

The Sophists, wandering teachers of the fifth century B. C. E., challenged Greek conventions in religion, morality, and political conduct. They rejected Hesiod’s moral dimension by rejecting the existence of divine lawgivers and universal moral principles. They rejected Hesiod’s historical dimension by denying any normative authority to custom. Might was right, and law functioned only in the political dimension as the will of the strongest.

The Sophist Protagoras of Abdera (b. circa 481 B. C. E.), rejected law’s moral dimension. As an agnostic, Protagoras rejected the divine lawgiver. As a moral relativist, Protagoras rejected the existence of universal moral principles. Unlike later Sophists, however, Protagoras accepted the validity of custom in law’s historical dimension.

Protagoras based his moral relativism on the argument that a shared factual knowledge of the world is impossible. The foundation of Protagoras’ relativism is the “man-measure” of the Aletheia (Truth). “Man is the measure of all things, of those that are that they are, of those that are not that they are not.”

Sense perception forms the basis of all knowledge, Protagoras believed, and every sense impression that a person receives is securely true. The data of sense perception, however, are private, subjective states. The wind is truly warm to the man who perceives it as warm, but the same wind is truly cold to the man who perceives it as cold. Perceived objects therefore have contradictory properties and there are no public facts.

Protagoras maintained that all knowledge claims are thus equally true. Furthermore, their truth endures regardless of conflicting claims. Protagoras therefore claimed “it is equally possible to affirm and deny anything of anything.” (Aristotle, Metaphysics, 1007b).

Protagoras extended his doctrine that all knowledge claims are equally true to claim that all virtue claims are equally true. Virtue claims are relative to the claimant because virtue is only another form of knowledge. (Plato, Protagoras, 323a-328d). There are no universal moral principles, and law’s moral dimension does not exist.

Although Protagoras rejected law’s moral dimension, he embraced law’s historical dimension. Although all knowledge and virtue claims are equally true, Protagoras argued they are not all equally sound. Only the ignorant equated truth with soundness. One set of thoughts can therefore be “better than another, but not in any way truer.” The same is true of laws. All laws are equally true, but not all laws are equally sound.

Protagoras accepted a duty to obey the law. Since no moral or legal code is truer than any other, no individual should assert his moral or legal judgments over those advanced by the state. Society is required to preserve humanity. The perpetuation of society, in turn, requires respect for law and custom. Men should obey the state’s laws and customs so long as they function soundly. (Plato, Protagoras, 322d; Theaetetus, 167b).

The Sophist Callicles (b. circa 484 B. C. E.), rejected law’s historical dimension and denied any duty to obey the law. Using “nature” to mean the antithesis of mind, Callicles argued that nature’s normative authority (phusis) supersedes the normative authority of man’s laws and customs (nomoi). Man’s laws and customs violate “nature’s own law” and “natural justice.” Nature’s law, not man’s, should govern our actions.

Callicles said that what men call “right” merely expresses what men believe to be to their advantage. Legal conventions in democracies wrongfully elevate the weak over the strong. The majority of weaker folk frame the laws for their advantage to prevent the stronger from gaining advantage over them. The true nature of right is established by nature, not men, and nature’s law establishes right in the strong. Natural justice provides that the better and wiser man should rule over and have more than the inferior. Might, therefore, makes right. All animals and races of man recognize right as the sovereignty and advantage of the stronger over the weaker. (Plato, Gorgias, 483b-d, 490a).

The Sophist Thrasymachus (b. circa 459 B. C. E.) argued for disobeying laws and customs. Defining justice as obedience to the laws, Thrasymachus argues that justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger. Obedience furthers the advantage of others and reduces the obedient to a form of slavery. Only disobedience to law profits a man and leads to his advantage. Injustice is therefore “a stronger, freer, and more masterful thing than justice.” (Plato, Republic, 338c-344c).

Solon’s constitution created an archetypal positivist legal system in Athens in 594 B. C. E. Solon reposed political and judicial authority in the heliastic courts. The courts enforced undefined laws with no standard of legal validity other than the unrestrained will of the jurors. Pericles’ introduction of payments for jurors in 451 B. C. E. enthroned Athens’ poorest and least educated class as dikasts in the heliastic courts. The Athenian courts became infamous for injustice and gullibility. Xenophon writes that Athenian courts often acted on emotion to put innocent men to death and acquit wrongdoers. (Xenophon 1990, pp.41-42). Eighty dikasts who found Socrates innocent voted for his death.

Athenian ostracism (ostrakismos) permitted the conviction, exile, and execution of any Athenian without charges, hearing, or defense. Originally intended for removing tyrants, Plutarch records that ostracism quickly became a way of pacifying jealousy of the eminent. Ostracism breathed out malice in exile and death. Every one was liable to it whose reputation, birth, or eloquence rose above the common level. (Plutarch 1914, pp. 2, 230, 233).

Athens ostracized its greatest heroes from envy of their honors. Athens ostracized Aristides, the hero of the Battle of Marathon, in 483 B. C. E. Athens ostracized Themistocles, savior of Athens at the Battle of Salamis, in 471 B. C. E. Both men were exiled for ten years without charges or a hearing.

Lack of procedural safeguards encouraged frivolous public prosecutions (graphai) and impeachments (eisangeliai), giving free reign to Athens’ gullible and imprudent dikasts. Frivolous political prosecutions destroyed Athens’ leadership, spawning bloody regime changes and military disasters. The frivolous prosecution of Pericles in 443 B. C. E. precipitated the Peloponnesian War with Sparta. The frivolous prosecution of Alcibiades in 415 B. C. E. caused Athens’ ablest general to switch sides and lead Sparta against Athens.

The greatest ignominy involves the Arginusae generals in 404 B. C. E. Six Athenian naval commanders won a great naval victory against Sparta at Arginusae. A violent storm prevented their recovering the dead and shipwrecked. The generals were nevertheless impeached and executed for failing to do so. Deprived of her best generals, Athens lost the war the next year in a devastating naval defeat at Aegospotami.

Political prosecutions wreaked political havoc as well. Five regime changes rocked Athens between 411 B. C. E. and 403 B. C. E. These regimes included the reign of terror by the Thirty Tyrants in 404 B. C. E.

Athenian positivism criminalized thought and expression in frivolous prosecutions against philosophers. Anaxagoras circa 430 B. C. E., Protagoras circa 415 B. C. E., and Socrates in 399 B. C. E. were all convicted on manufactured charges of impiety (asebeia). Impiety was undefined by Athenian law. Every juror defined it anew in every case as he pleased.

Athens often regretted its decisions. Socrates’ lead accuser Anytus was stoned for his role in Socrates’ death. Athens honored Socrates with a bronze statue by Lysippus. Athens thus gained “the indelible reproach of decreeing to the same citizens the hemlock on one day and statues on the next.” (Hamilton 2010, p. 289).

2. Plato

Plato described Socrates as the bravest, wisest, and most upright man of his time. Plato planned a career in politics but “withdrew in disgust” after observing how Athenian courts “corrupted the written laws and customs.” (Plato, Letter VII, 325a-c). Plato reacted to Socrates’ death by repudiating the Sophists, reviving law’s moral and historical dimensions, and formulating a natural law standard of legal validity based on principles of universal justice.

Plato begins his revival of law’s historical dimension by emphasizing the autonomy of law, which he considered the most important aspect of government. Autonomous laws wield supremacy over political rulers. Political rulers are subject to the same laws as other citizens, and they may not alter the laws to suit their will.

Plato wrote that the preservation or ruin of a community depends on the autonomy of laws more than anything else. Respecting law’s autonomy preserves the entire community. Disregarding it brings destruction. Autonomy is so important that “the man who is most perfect in obedience to established law” should receive the highest post in government. The second most obedient man should receive the second highest post, and so on for all the posts. (Plato, Laws, 715c-d.)

Plato begins his revival of law’s moral dimension by persuasively refuting Protagoras’ moral relativism in the Theaetetus. Protagoras claimed that all sense perceptions are equally true. Since knowledge is perception, all knowledge claims are equally true. Since moral claims are a species of knowledge claims, all moral claims are equally true. Therefore, no one set of moral principles has authority to guide the laws.

Plato offers eleven objections to Protagoras’ arguments in the Theaetetus. Three are recounted here. First, Plato denies that knowledge is perception. If knowledge were perception, we would understand anyone speaking to us in a foreign tongue. This is clearly not the case. Second, remembered knowledge refutes Protagoras’ claim that knowledge is perception. Remembered knowledge involves no perception, but it is knowledge nonetheless.

Third, moral relativism is self-refuting. Assume, as Protagoras claims, that “all beliefs are true.” Assume also that another man exists who believes that “not all beliefs are true.” If Protagoras is correct, then the second man’s belief must be true. Protagoras’ belief that “all beliefs are true” is thus refuted. (Plato, Theaetetus, 160e-177b).

Plato continues his revival of law’s moral and historical dimensions in the Crito. The Crito considers whether a duty exists to obey the law. Socrates’ friend Crito argues for Socrates to escape and avoid his unjust execution.

Socrates replies that the soul is more precious than the body. Good actions benefit our souls, but wrong actions mutilate them. The important thing is not living, but living well. This means living honorably. Socrates utilizes three principles in determining whether to escape. First, circumstances never justify wrong action. Second, one should not injure others, even when they injure you. Third, one “ought to honor one’s agreements, provided they are right.” (Plato, Crito, 47e-49e).

Plato defines law’s moral dimension through these principles. Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis defines its moral dimension by these same principles in the sixth century. (Justinian, Digest, 1.1.10). Blackstone’s Commentaries does the same in the eighteenth century. (Blackstone 1828, p. 27).

Plato next refutes Thrasymachus’ claim in the Republic that disobeying the law “is a stronger, freer, and more masterful thing” than obeying the law. In the Crito’s “Speech of the Laws,” the Laws present two arguments for obedience. The first is the “argument from agreement.” Socrates has undertaken to live his life in obedience to Athens’ laws. Athens did not force Socrates to live in its precincts. Socrates was free to leave at any time. By choosing to stay in Athens with full knowledge of how the laws functioned, Socrates promised obedience to the laws.

The Laws’ orders are “in the form of proposals, not savage commands.” Socrates can either obey the Laws or persuade (the personification of) the Law that they are at fault. If Socrates escapes without persuading the personification of the Laws that they were at fault, he would dishonor his agreement to obey the laws. Dishonoring a just agreement violates the ethic of “living well” and damages the soul.

The Laws’ second argument is the “argument from injury.” Disobedience destroys both the Laws and the city, which cannot exist if legal judgments are ignored. Socrates concludes that “both in war and in the law courts and everywhere else you must do whatever your city and your country command, or else persuade them in accordance with universal justice” that they are at fault.

The Laws’ second argument implies a natural law standard of validity based on principles of universal justice. The Laws insist they operate as “proposals, not savage commands.” Socrates’ duty to obey the Laws is contingent on the Laws’ compliance with principles of universal justice. By implication, there is no duty to obey the Laws if they violate principles of universal justice. (Plato, Crito, 51e-52d).

3. Aristotle

Aristotle designs his legal philosophy to avoid the catastrophes described in his Athenian Constitution. Aristotle accepts the necessity of law’s political dimension because laws cannot enforce themselves. Nevertheless, the Athenian legal history proves the political dimension is not sufficient to preserve a society or achieve its happiness.

Human nature demands more than political power from law. Law must accomplish justice and foster virtue. Justice is required to prevent revolution, and virtue is required for human happiness. Man separated from justice is “the worst of animals,” and man without virtue “is the most unholy and the most savage of animals.” (Aristotle, Politics 1253a).

Aristotle writes in the Politics that securing justice is the state’s most important function. Justice is more essential to the state than providing the necessities of life. Governments must be founded on justice to endure. Governments that rule unjustly and give unequal treatment to similarly placed subjects provoke revolutions. Justice maintained, however, forms a bond between the members of society that preserves the state. (Aristotle, Politics 1328b, 1332b, 1253a).

Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics defines justice as lawfulness concerned with the common advantage and happiness of the political community. Aristotle distinguishes between legal justice (to nomikon dikaion) and natural justice (physikon dikaion). Legal justice involves positive laws and custom enacted by man, such as conventional measures for grain and wine. These “are just not by nature but by human enactment” and “are not everywhere the same.”Aristotle secures legal justice by granting autonomy to law and by utilizing custom to encourage obedience. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1134b-1135a).

Natural justice, on the other hand, involves principles of natural law that originate in nature. Such principles do not arise in the minds of men “by people’s thinking this or that.” Natural law principles apply with equal force everywhere, just as fire burns both in Greece and in Persia. Aristotle secures natural justice by adopting natural law precepts as the standard of legal validity. Positive laws that violate natural law precepts are nullified. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1134b).

Aristotle secures legal justice by restricting the will of the political ruler through autonomous laws. The Politics teaches that unrestrained power produces tyranny, even in democracies. Aristotle considers whether societies function best under the “rule of men” or the “rule of law.” He concludes that laws, when good, should be supreme. Political rulers should merely complement the law by acting as its guardians and ministers. They should only regulate those matters on which the laws are unable to speak with precision owing to the difficulty of any general principle embracing all particulars. (Aristotle, Politics, 1282b).

Aristotle gives four reasons for emphasizing law’s autonomy over the will of the political ruler. First, law frees the state from the desires and passions that afflict political rulers. “The law is reason unaffected by desire. Desire … is a wild beast, and passion perverts the minds of rulers, even when they are the best of men.” (Aristotle, Politics, 1287a). Second, tyranny results when political rulers exercise autonomy over law, even in democracies. Third, the orderly rotation of political offices requires autonomous laws. Equality, liberty, justice, and expediency mandate that every mature citizen participates in governing the state. Fourth, the orderly rotation of political offices preserves the state by assuring evenhanded administration by magistrates.

Aristotle utilizes law’s historical dimension to secure legal justice through custom. Aristotle uses the term nomos for law, and nomos includes custom and convention as components of the social norm. Aristotle writes in the Politics that legal custom is itself a form of justice. Custom and convention maintain social stability by encouraging obedience to the law. The law has no power to command obedience except that of habit, which can only be given by time. Aristotle urges caution in changing the law because changes enfeeble the power of the law. If the advantage of a change is small, it is wiser to leave errors in the law. The citizens usually lose more by the habit of disobedience than they gain by changing the law. (Aristotle, Politics, 1255a, 1269a).

Aristotle utilizes law’s moral dimension to secure natural justice in two ways. The first is by nullifying positive laws that subvert natural law precepts. Aristotle formulates a natural law standard of legal validity. Aristotle’s Rhetoric describes natural law as an unwritten law, based on nature, and common to all people. “There is in nature a common principle of the just and unjust that all people in some way divine.” (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b).

Natural law provides immutable and universal standards of justice. Natural law constitutes a separate body of binding law that exceeds positive law in authority. Human actions should complete nature rather than subvert it, and natural law nullifies positive laws that subvert natural law precepts. (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b).

Like Plato, Aristotle argues that the universal standards of natural law justify disobeying positive laws. Aristotle’s Rhetoric provides two examples invalidating positive law for violating natural law precepts. The first is the case of Sophocles’ Antigone, where Antigone disobeys Creon’s order and provides funeral rites to her brother Polyneices. The second is Aristotle’s guide to jury nullification of written law by appealing to higher principles of natural law. (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b, 1375a-b).

Aristotle never explains why natural law wields supremacy over positive law. The supremacy of natural law is consistent, however, with Aristotle’s view in the Physics that the ultimate causes of nature are divine. (Aristotle, Physics, 198b-199b).

The second way that Aristotle secures natural justice is by fostering virtue. Aristotle believed that human happiness depended on virtue more than liberty. The government is thus responsible for producing a virtuous state, and this is best accomplished through law. Although virtue encompasses more than mere conformity to law, virtue will only develop and flourish in a state that supports the legal enforcement of virtue. The state must provide moral education through its laws to make its citizens just and good. Failing to do so undermines the state’s political system and harms its citizens. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1179b; Politics, 1280b, 1310a, 1337a).

4. Cicero

Marcus Tullius Cicero (106-43 B. C. E.) was a politician, philosopher, orator, and attorney. Cicero’s De Legibus (The Laws), De Officis (On Duties), and De Re Publica (The Republic) greatly influence the natural law tradition. Cicero esteemed Plato and Aristotle. Although not a Stoic, Cicero adopted Stoicism’s divine Nature as the source of natural law precepts that dictate legal validity. The histories of Herodotus, Thucydides, Xenophon, and Polybius persuaded Cicero that natural law imposes justice on human events.

Cicero’s signature contribution to jurisprudence is his explication of Nature as divine lawgiver. Law and justice originate in Nature as a divinely ordained set of universal moral principles. Cicero describes Nature as the omnipotent ruler of the universe, the omnipresent observer of every individual’s intentions and actions, and the common master of all people. Belief in divine Nature stabilizes society, encourages obedience to law, and leads to individual virtue. (Cicero, De Legibus, 2.15-16).

Law’s moral dimension dominates Cicero’s jurisprudence. Cicero defines natural law as perfect reason in commanding and prohibiting. These principles are the sole source of justice and provide the sole standard of legal validity. “True law is right reason in agreement with Nature.” (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

The precepts of natural law are eternal and immutable. They apply universally at all places, at all times, and to all people. Natural law summons to duty by its commands, and averts from wrongdoing by its prohibitions. Nature serves as the enforcing judge of natural law precepts, and Nature’s punishment for violating natural law precepts is inescapable. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

Natural law provides the naturae norma, the standard of legal validity for positive law and custom. The naturae norma provides the only means for separating good provisions from bad. Justice entails that laws and customs comply with the naturae norma and preserve the peace, happiness, and safety of the state and its citizens. Positive laws and customs that fail to do so are not regarded as laws at all. (Cicero, De Legibus, 1.44, 2.11-2.14).

Regarding Cicero’s political dimension of law, the magistrate’s limited role is to govern and to issue orders that are just and advantageous in keeping with the laws. Although the magistrate has some control of the people, the laws are fully in control of the magistrate. An official is the speaking law, and the law is a nonspeaking official. (Cicero, De Legibus, 3.2).

Political rulers cannot alter, repeal, or abolish natural law precepts. Furthermore, political rulers have no role in interpreting or explaining natural law precepts. Every man can discern the precepts of natural law for himself through reason. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

Political rulers must issue just commands as measured by natural law precepts. Individuals are protected against unjust coercion. Although rulers may use sanctions to enforce legitimate commands, every affected subject has the right to appeal to the people before enforcement of any sanction. Furthermore, no ruler can issue commands concerning single individuals. Any significant sanction against an individual, such as execution or loss of citizenship, is reserved to the highest assembly of the people. As a further protection, all laws must be officially recorded by the censors. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 2.53-2.54; De Legibus, 3.10-3.47).

Like Aristotle, Cicero requires that magistrates be subject to the power of others. Successive terms are forbidden, and ten years must pass before the magistrate becomes eligible for the same office. Every magistrate leaving office must submit an account of his official acts to the censors. Misconduct is subject to prosecution. No magistrate may give or receive any gifts while seeking or holding office, or after the conclusion of his term. (Cicero, De Legibus, 3.9-3.11).

Regarding Cicero’s historical dimension of law, Cicero agrees with Aristotle that custom maintains social stability by encouraging obedience to law. Custom can even achieve immortality for the commonwealth. The commonwealth will be eternal if citizens conduct their lives in accordance with ancestral laws and customs. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.41).

5. Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis

The Corpus Juris Civilis (Body of Civil Law) codified Roman law pursuant to the decree of Justinian I. Completed in A.D. 535, the four works of the Corpus became the sole legal authorities in the empire. The Institutes was a law school text. The Codex contained statutes dating from A.D. 76. The Digest contained commentaries by leading jurists, and the New Laws was supplemented as new laws became necessary.

The Corpus is the direct ancestor of modtern Wester civil law systems. Its influence on canon law is seen in the medieval maim Ecclesia vivit lege romana (the Church lives on Roman law). Common law jurisprudence never accepted the Corpus as binding authority. Nevertheless, its twelfth century revival profoundly influenced the formation of common law jurisprudence through the works of the father of the common law, Henry de Bracton (C. E. 1210 – C. E. 1268).

The Corpus divides law into public law involving state interests and private law governing individuals. Private law is a mixture of natural law, the law of nations, and municipal law. The Corpus establishes a clear hierarchy among law’s three dimensions. The moral dimension occupies the highest position and provides the standard of legal validity. The historical dimension of legal custom occupies the second position, and the political dimension of Roman municipal law occupies the lowest position.

The Corpus’ moral dimension resides in two bodies of law, natural law and the law of nations. Like Cicero, the Corpus originates natural law in a divine lawgiver. “The laws of nature, which are observed by all nations alike, are established by divine providence.” The precepts of natural law are universal, eternal, and immutable. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.2.11; Digest, 1.3.2).

Natural law governs all land, air, and sea creatures, including man. “The law of nature is that which she has taught all animals; a law not peculiar to the human race, but shared by all living creatures.” The Corpus extends natural law to “all living creatures” to repudiate the Sophist arguments that law is merely a human convention with no basis in nature, justice does not exist, and there is no duty to obey law. The Corpus‘ rebuttal focuses on the highly socialized behavior of such animal species as ants, bees, and birds. Although animals cannot legislate or form social conventions, they nevertheless follow norms of behavior. These norms affirm the existence of natural law. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.1.3, 2.1.11).

The Institutes and the Digest state three precepts of natural law: “Honeste vivere, alterum non laedere, suum cuique tribuere.” Live honorably, injure no one, and give every man his due. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.1.3; Digest, 1.1.10). These precepts track the Crito’s admonishments to live well, harm no one, and honor agreements so long as they are honorable. (Plato, Crito, 47e-49e). Blackstone’s Commentaries adopts these exact precepts. (Blackstone 1828, p. 27).

The law of nations is the portion of natural law that governs relations between human beings. (Justinian, Digest, 1.4). Its rules are “prescribed by natural reason for all men” and “observed by all peoples alike.” The law of nations is the source of duties to God, one’s parents, and one’s country. It recognizes human rights to life, liberty, and self-defense, and its recognition of property rights enables contracts and commerce between peoples.

The precepts of natural law provide the standard for legal validity. This standard voids any right or duty violating natural law precepts. The Institutes provides illustrative examples: Contracts created for immoral purposes, such as carrying out a homicide or a sacrilege, are not enforceable. (Justinian, Institutes, 3.19.24). Immorality invalidates wrongful profits. Anyone profiting from wrongful dominion over another’s property must disgorge those profits.(Justinian, Digest, 5.3.52).

Immorality invalidates agency relationships. Agents are not obliged to carry out immoral instructions from their principals. If they do, they are not entitled to indemnity from their principals for any liability the agents incur. (Justinian, Institutes, 3.26.7). Immorality even invalidates bequests and legacies if the bequest is contingent upon immoral conduct.(Justinian, Institutes, 2.20.36).

The Corpus’ historical dimension provides custom as a source of enforceable law. The Corpus defines legal custom as the tacit consent of a people established by long-continued habit. Since custom evidences the consent of the people, it is a higher source of law than positive or statutory law.Statutory provisions, if customarily ignored, are treated like repealed legislation. (Justinian, Digest, 1.1.3).

Legal custom establishes the autonomy of law over political rulers. Custom binds judges. A judge’s first duty is “to not judge contrary to statutes, the imperial laws, and custom.” Legal custom even controls statutory interpretation. “Custom is the best interpreter of statutes.” (Justinian, Institutes, 4.17; Digest, 1.1.37).

The Corpus’ political dimension resides in its six categories of Roman municipal law, the “statutes, plebiscites, senatusconsults, enactments of the Emperors, edicts of the magistrates, and answers of those learned in the law.” In contrast to natural law and the law of nations, Roman municipal law was unique to Rome. Its provisions were also “subject to frequent change, either by the tacit consent of the people, or by the subsequent enactment of another statute.” (Justinian, Institutes, 1.2.3, 1.2.11).

6. Aquinas

Thomas Aquinas‘ Summa Theologica recognizes all three dimensions of law as potential sources of valid law. The moral dimension wields supremacy, however, through a rigid standard of legal validity. Human laws that fail this standard are not merely unenforceable; they are “perversions of law,” “acts of violence,” and “no law at all.” (Aquinas, Summa Theologica, quest. 94 art. 4; quest. 95 art. 2).

Common law jurisprudence has never accepted Aquinas’ natural law theory. It differs in important ways from Blackstone’s natural law theory. Thomism nevertheless influenced the philosophical method taught in Roman Catholic institutions. Martin Luther King Jr. invoked Aquinas’ natural law theory in the Birmingham jail to justify civil disobedience, and Aquinas’ theory motivates contemporary opponents of abortion and euthanasia.

Question 97 establishes both God and man as lawgivers. Divine and natural law come from the rational will of God. Human law comes from the will of man, regulated by reason. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 97 art. 3).

Question 90 defines four existence conditions for law. The first condition is that law is an ordinance of reason, that law is created by a being with reason to achieve a goal. The second condition is that the law has the common good as its goal and that laws must distribute their burdens equitably and proportionately among their subjects. The third condition is a lawgiver who has care of the community because unless the lawgiver holds sufficient power to coerce obedience, the law cannot induce its subjects to virtue. The fourth condition is publication, which is required for law to have the binding force to compel obedience. Each condition is necessary for law, and together they are sufficient. Failing any condition renders a purported law an act of violence. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 1-4).

Question 91 divides law into four types. Eternal law is the set of timeless truths that govern the movement and behavior of all things in the universe, including human beings. Divine law is the word of God revealed to man to guide him to his supernatural end. God reveals divine law to operate because human reason is inadequate to discover its precepts. Natural law is that portion of the eternal law that governs the behavior of human beings. Natural law is derived from eternal law, and its precepts are discovered by reason. Human law is any law of human authorship. Man creates human law in order to implement the precepts of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 91 art. 1-4).

Question 94 presents Aquinas’ theory of natural law. God writes natural law in the hearts of men, and man discerns the natural law using practical reason. Four natural inclinations enable man to discern the precepts of natural law. The first is an inclination to seek after good. The second is an inclination to preserve one’s own according to one’s nature. Man shares these first two inclinations with all substances. The third is an inclination to reproduce, raise, and educate one’s offspring. Man shares this inclination with animals. The fourth is an inclination “to know the truth about God and to live in society.” This inclination is unique to man. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 2).

Aquinas divides natural law into “first principles” and “secondary principles.” First principles are unchanging. They are always known by all human beings and they are binding on all human beings. They are mutually consistent, and conflict between them is impossible. They cannot be “blotted out from men’s hearts.” (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 6).

The first principles of natural law contain four precepts, each reflecting one of man’s natural inclinations. The first precept is to pursue good and avoid evil. The second is to preserve life and ward off its obstacles. The third is to reproduce, raise, and educate one’s offspring. The fourth is to pursue knowledge and to live together in society. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 2).

Secondary principles of natural law differ significantly from first principles. Secondary principles are subject to change, albeit rarely and for special causes. They are not always known by all persons and they are not always binding. These differences result from practical reason’s susceptibility to perversion by passion, evil habits, and evil dispositions. Lastly, secondary principles can be blotted out from men’s hearts through “evil persuasions,” errors in “speculative matters,” vicious customs,” and “corrupt habits.” (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 6).

Secondary principles form three categories. The first involves secondary principles that are always known by all persons and are always binding, such as “do not murder or slay the innocent.” The second category involves principles that are always binding but not always known, such as “do not steal.” Julius Caesar reports in the Gallic Wars, for example, that the Germans did not know it was wrong to steal. The third category involves principles that are not always binding, such as “goods entrusted to another should be restored.” Although usually binding, this principle does not bind the return of another’s weapons to be used against one’s country. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 4).

Questions 95 through 97 discuss human law. Human law exists because the great variety of human affairs prevents the first principles of natural law from being applied to all men in the same way. Human reason derives human law from natural law precepts for particular matters, and this process creates a diversity of positive law among different peoples. The “force” accorded to human law depends on the method by which it is derived from natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

Aquinas specifies two methods. The first method involves taking a “conclusion” from a premise of natural law. As in science, reason draws specific conclusions of human law by demonstration from natural law principles. Reason demonstrates the human law conclusion that “one must not kill” from the natural law principle that “one should do harm to no man.” Human laws derived by this method have some force of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

The second method for deriving human law involves making a “determination” from generalities of natural law. As in the arts, details are derived from general forms. A carpenter begins with the general form of a house in his mind, but he must determine the details of its construction as he builds it. Reason determines that murderers should be imprisoned for twenty years from the natural law principle that evildoers should be punished. Unlike conclusions of human law, determinations have no force of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

Question 96 provides a narrow scope for human law. Human laws should not repress all the vices forbidden by natural law. Since most people are incapable of abstaining from all vices, human law should only prohibit those vices whose suppression is essential for preserving society. Human laws should prohibit murder and theft but remain silent as to lesser vices. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 2).

The Summa provides a fully developed standard of legal validity. Question 96 provides that human laws must be just. Justice requires that human laws accomplish both divine good and human good as described below. Unjust laws are not merely unenforceable; they are perversions of law and acts of violence, and they are powerless to bind the conscience. They are, in fact, not laws at all. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Human laws accomplish divine good by satisfying the requirements of natural law and divine law. Purported laws that conflict with divine good, natural law or divine law should always be disobeyed. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Human laws accomplish human good if and only if they meet three conditions. First, the end of the law must be the common good. Second, the human lawgiver must not exceed his power in establishing the law. Third, the burdens of the law must be shared equitably and proportionately by all members of society. Failure to meet any of these conditions renders the purported law unjust. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Purported laws that conflict with human good are unjust and may usually be disobeyed. If the purported law fails to meet one of the standards for human good, it may be disobeyed. An exception arises, however, if disobedience results in “greater harm” or creates a scandal. The unjust human law should then be obeyed, even though it is not truly a law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Critics often charge that Aquinas’ claim that “an unjust law is no law at all” is incoherent. This criticism seemingly disregards Aquinas’ definition of law in Question 95. Laws have “just so much of the nature of law” as they are derived from natural law. Natural law is always just. To be considered law “at all,” therefore, human laws must be just. A purported law that is unjust is not truly a law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

7. Blackstone

Sir William Blackstone’s Commentaries on the Laws of England is the standard statement of common law jurisprudence. Blackstone imposes two standards of legal validity, one based on custom and the other on natural law. Purported laws that fail these standards are not merely “bad law,” they are “not law.” (Blackstone 1838, p. 47).

Law’s historical dimension provides the validity standard based on custom and serves as the primary source of human law. The historical dimension also emphasizes the autonomy of custom over the will of political rulers. Law’s moral dimension provides the validity standard based on natural law. The moral dimension also establishes natural rights as limits on the will of the political ruler and protects these rights through due process. The political dimension provides only a limited source of law, and the historical and moral dimensions severely restrict the political ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion.

Law’s historical dimension dominates Blackstone’s jurisprudence. Custom is “the first ground and chief corner stone” of common law. Custom includes rules of law, such as the rule of primogeniture, which says the oldest male descendant inherits the entire estate. Custom also includes legal principles in the forms of maxims, such as “the king can do no wrong,” “no man is bound to accuse himself,” and “no man ought to benefit from his own wrong.” Law’s historical dimension is so strong in common law that approved statutes were strictly construed and interpreted whenever possible to comply with pre-existing custom. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 46, 50).

Blackstone divides customary law into three types. The first type, “general customs,” applies to the entire kingdom. The second type, “particular customs,” only apply to limited regions or specialized groups like merchants. For illustration, the “general custom” of inheritance for England is primogeniture where the eldest son inherits all. Nevertheless, the “particular custom” of gavelkind permits shared inheritance in Kent. The third type, “peculiar laws,” includes Roman civil law and Catholic canon law. These laws have no authority in England except as the people have consented to their provisions through customary observance. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 45-57).

The validity standard for custom includes seven requirements. First, the custom must “have been used so long, that the memory of man runs not to the contrary.” Proof of any time when the custom did not exist voids the custom. Second, the custom must enjoy continuous observance, interruption voids the custom. Third, the custom must enjoy peaceable observance. Custom depends upon consent, and disputed customs lack consent. Fourth, customs must be “reasonable” and must not create unnecessary hardships.Fifth, the custom must be certain. A custom that the worthiest son inherits is void because no certain standard for worthiness exists. Sixth, compliance must be mandatory. Optional customs have no coercive force. Lastly, customs must be consistent. Inconsistent customs lack mutual consent. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 53-55).

Law’s moral dimension provides a standard of legal validity based on natural law. Blackstone’s natural law founds justice on the eternal and immutable laws of good and evil to which the creator himself conforms. God is a being of infinite power, infinite wisdom, and infinite goodness. Although God endows man with reason and free will, man is still “entirely dependent” on God. Man is subject to God’s law, and God’s law is natural law. Natural law is binding over the entire globe, in all countries, and at all times. No human laws are of any validity if they conflict with natural law, and valid human laws derive all their force and authority from natural law.

Natural law precepts are discernible by reason as far as they are necessary for the conduct of human actions. Unlike Aquinas, however, Blackstone regards human reason as “frail, imperfect, and blind” since man’s fall. To overcome these defects of human reason, God reveals the precepts of natural law through direct revelation in scripture. The validity of human law depends on the two foundations of natural law and revealed law. Human laws contradicting their precepts are void.

Natural law permits acts that promote true happiness and prohibits acts that destroy it. Natural law derives from the precept “that man should pursue his own true and substantial happiness.” God created human nature so that man obtains happiness by pursuing justice. Injustice brings unhappiness.

Substantively, natural law consists of eternal immutable laws of good and evil. Blackstone adopts three precepts of natural law from Justinian’s Institutes. “Such, among others, are these principles: that we should live honestly, should hurt nobody, and should render to every one his due; to which three general precepts Justinian has reduced the whole doctrine of law.” (Blackstone 1838, pp. 27-28).

Blackstone divides jurisprudence into natural law and positive law. Positive law provisions contrary to natural law are invalid. Individuals are furthermore bound to disobey them, such as laws requiring murder. Nevertheless, natural law does not determine every legal issue. Natural law is indifferent, for example, as to whether positive law permits the export of wool. On most issues, man is at liberty to adopt positive laws that benefit society. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 28-29).

Blackstone divides rights into two types, absolute rights and relative rights. The “immutable laws of nature” vest absolute rights in individuals. Individuals enjoy absolute rights in the state of nature, prior to the formation of society. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 88, 94).

Blackstone names three absolute rights: personal security, personal liberty, and private property. The absolute right of personal security consists of the legal enjoyment of life, limb, body, health, and reputation. The absolute right of personal liberty consists of the free power of movement without imprisonment or restraint unless by due course of law. The absolute right of property consists of the free use and disposal of lawful acquisitions, without injury or illegal diminution. (Blackstone 1838, pp 93-100).

Relative rights, in contrast to absolute rights, exist only in society. Relative rights protect and maintain inviolate the three absolute rights of personal security, personal liberty, and private property. Unlike absolute rights, which are few and simple, relative rights are more numerous and more complicated. Such rights include due process protections as well as “Blackstone’s ratio,” which says it is better that ten guilty persons escape than one innocent party suffers. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 89, 102).

Law’s political dimension is severely delimited in Blackstone’s jurisprudence. Society is formed for the protection of individuals. In addition to the validity standards discussed above, Blackstone’s historical dimension dictates a near absolute standard of legal autonomy. Law wields supremacy over the will of political rulers, whether they are kings or judges. (Blackstone 1838, p. 32).

Regarding the autonomy of law over kings, the most important maxim in English history is “the law makes the king; the king does not make the law.” This maxim dates from Henry de Bracton’s 1235 treatise The Laws and Customs of the Kingdom of England. “The king must not be under man but under God and under the law, because the law makes the king … there is no king where the will and not the law has dominion.” (De Bracton 1968, p. 33).

Regarding the autonomy of law over judges, Blackstone’s “declaratory theory” prohibits judges from making new law. Judges may only find and declare existing law; they may never make law. Judge-made law unites the power to make and enforce law in one body, and this invites tyranny. The judge should determine the law according to the known laws and customs of the land, not his own private judgment. Judges are not appointed to pronounce new laws. (Blackstone 1838, p. 46, 105).

Nevertheless, since all law is subject to the standard of reason, judges may set aside common law precedents that are contrary to reason as “manifestly absurd or unjust.” Setting unreasonable precedents aside does not create new law. Instead, it vindicates the law from misrepresentation. Unreasonable rules of common law, by definition, are not law. Such precedents are not set aside because they are bad law, but because they are not law. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 46-47).

In applying statutory law, however, the judge may never exercise his discretion to set aside the will of Parliament. The only authority that can declare an act of Parliament void is Parliament itself. The judge must “interpret and obey” its mandates. Judges may never act as miniature legislatures. “In a democracy,” writes Blackstone, “the right of making laws resides in the people at large.” (Blackstone 1838, pp. 27, 33).

8. Bentham

Legal positivism rejects law’s moral and historical dimensions as sources of law or standards of legal validity. H. L. A. Hart is the most important figure in the positivist tradition that begins with Jeremy Bentham and John Austin. Bentham was sixteen when he attended a series of private lectures by Blackstone on the common law. These lectures were later published as Blackstone’s Commentaries.

The young Bentham listened with rebel ears. Bentham’s anonymous Fragment on Government describes Blackstone’s natural law theory as “theological grimgribber” and an “excursion into the land of fancy.” Bentham describes Blackstone as “the dupe of every prejudice,” “the accomplice of every chicanery,” “the abettor of every abuse,” and “a treasury of vulgar errors.” (Bentham 1977, 10).

Bentham’s legal theory has two distinctive features. The first is Bentham’s exclusion of law’s historical dimension. Bentham’s “imperative” theory of law defines law as (1) the assemblage of signs of a sovereign’s volition, (2) directing the conduct of persons under his power, (3) accompanied by an “expectation” in such persons, that (4) motivates obedience. The sovereign’s will provides its own validity standard. Custom is excluded and the ruler wields autonomy over law. (Bentham 1970, p. 1).

Bentham’s second distinctive feature is his exclusion of law’s moral dimension. Law for Bentham has no necessary conceptual connection with morality. Bentham abandons Blackstone’s immutable standards of right and wrong for physical sensations of pleasure and pain: “Nature has placed mankind under the governance of two sovereign masters, pain and pleasure. It is for them alone to point out what we ought to do.” (Bentham 1907, p. 1).

Bentham’s Anarchical Fallacies argues that natural laws and natural rights are imaginary. “Natural rights is simple nonsense: natural and imprescriptable rights, nonsense upon stilts.” Positive law is the only real law. Only positive law can create real rights, and positive law requires the existence of a sovereign. There can be no rights outside the existence of a sovereign command, and no rights can exist prior to the formation of a government. In sum, the will of the sovereign provides its own standard of legal validity, unrestrained by morality, custom, or the autonomy of law. (Bentham 1843, pp. 501-05).

9. Austin

John Austin‘s The Province of Jurisprudence Determined defines law’s political dimension as the sole source of law and legal validity. Like Bentham’s “imperative” theory, Austin’s “command” theory of law establishes the political ruler’s will as its own standard of legal validity. The sovereign can coerce his will through law without restraint by moral principles, custom, or the autonomy of law.

Austin’s “command” theory defines law as (a) commands, (b) backed by threat of sanctions, (c) from a sovereign, (d) to whom people have a habit of obedience. A common criticism of Austin’s theory is that the command of a gun-wielding highwayman arguably satisfies Austin’s definition of law.

The “command” theory rejects law’s historical dimension. Legal customs and principles play no part in law. Law wields no autonomy over the political ruler’s will, including the will of judges. In contrast to Blackstone, Austin encourages judges to legislate from the bench. Society cannot function unless judges are free to make new law to correct the negligence and incapacity of legislatures. (Austin 2000, p. 191, 225-31).

Austin’s “command” theory rejects law’s moral dimension as well. Austin labels Blackstone’s natural law validity standard “stark nonsense.” God’s law is uncertain, and Blackstone’s natural law standard preaches anarchy. Austin writes that “the existence of law is one thing; its merit and demerit another. Whether it be or be not is one enquiry; whether it be or be not conformable to an assumed standard, is a different enquiry. A law, which actually exists, is a law, though we happen to dislike it.” (Austin 2000, p. 184).

10. Hart

Hart’s 1957 lecture “Positivism and the Separation of Law and Morals” emphasizes three doctrines asserted by Bentham and Austin. The first, which Hart retains, is an emphasis on “the meaning of the distinctive vocabulary of the law.” The second doctrine, which Hart retains, is the separation of law and morals. Hart holds law “as it is” distinct from law “as it ought to be.” This distinction rejects moral standards as the test for legal validity. (Hart 1958, pp. 594, 601).

The third doctrine, which Hart rejects, is Austin’s command theory of law. Hart rejects Austin’s theory for four reasons. First, Austin fails to recognize that laws generally apply to those who enact them. Second, Austin does not account for laws granting public powers, such as the power to legislate or adjudicate, or for laws granting private powers to create or modify legal relations. Third, Austin fails to account for laws that originate, not from a sovereign, but out of common custom. Fourth, Austin fails to account for the continuity of legislative authority characteristic of a modern legal system. (Hart 1994, p. 70).

Hart replaces Austin’s “command” theory with a model of law as the union of primary and secondary social rules. A primary rule is a rule that imposes an obligation or a duty. “[P]rimary rules are concerned with the actions that individuals must or must not do,” such as restrictions on “violence, theft, and deception.” A rule imposes an obligation or duty when the demand for conformity is insistent and the social pressure brought to bear upon those who deviate from the rule is great. (Hart 1994, pp. 91, 94).

In order for a system of primary rules to function effectively, Hart states that secondary rules may also be necessary to provide an authoritative statement of all the primary rules. In contrast to primary rules, which impose obligations and duties, secondary rules confer powers to introduce, to change, or to modify a primary rule. These powers may be public or private. (Hart 1994, pp. 96-97).

There are three types of secondary rules. The first type is the rule of change. This rule allows legislators to make changes in the primary rules if the primary rules are defective or inadequate. The second type is the rule of adjudication. This rule enables courts to resolve disputes regarding the interpretation and application of primary rules. The third type of secondary rule is the rule of recognition. The rule of recognition provides “a rule for conclusive identification of the primary rules of obligation.” It also provides Hart’s criterion for legal validity. A rule of law is legally valid if it conforms to the requirements of the rule of recognition. (Hart 1994, pp. 95-98, 103-05).

Hart next turns from defining the validity criteria for individual laws to defining the validity criteria for entire legal systems. System validity is determined by the attitudes of citizens and public officials toward obedience to legal rules. Hart describes two contrasting attitudes, the “external” and “internal” points of view.

The external point of view is the view of a person who feels no obligation to follow the law. He has no sense that it is right to follow the law or wrong not to do so. He rejects law as the standard of conduct for himself or others. The internal point of view, on the other hand, is the view of a person who feels obligated to follow the law. He follows the law because he thinks it is right to do so and wrong not to do so. He feels that he ought, must, and should follow the law. (Hart 1994, pp. 56-57).

The validity of a legal system depends on only two conditions. First, private citizens must generally obey the primary rules of obligation. It is sufficient that citizens take an external point of view toward primary rules. Second, public officials must adopt the rule of recognition specifying the criteria for legal validity as their “public standard of official behavior.” It is a minimum, necessary condition that officials take the internal point of view toward secondary rules. (Hart 1994, pp. 116-17).

Hart’s standard of legal validity functions solely in law’s political dimension. The will of the political rulers determines the validity of law by their adoption of a rule of recognition. The will of the political rulers determines the validity of the legal system as well. The only necessary condition for a valid legal system is the political rulers’ adoption of the internal point of view.

Hart excludes the historical dimension from his standard of legal validity. Hart omits, for example, two of the historical dimension’s traditional restraints on the will of the political ruler. The first, emphasized since Aristotle, is the autonomy of law over political rulers. Instead, Hart’s political rulers wield autonomy over law by controlling the standard of legal validity. Hart also grants judges autonomy over law by rejecting Blackstone’s declaratory theory that judges find but do not make law. If the judge determines the meaning of a legal rule to be “indeterminate or incomplete,” the judge “must exercise his discretion and make law for the case instead of merely applying already pre-existing settled law.”

The second historical restraint, emphasized by Locke and Blackstone, is the validity requirement of consent by the governed. Consent is irrelevant to Hart’s legal validity. It is sufficient that each member of the population obeys Hart’s primary rules “from any motive whatsoever.” “Any motive,” as Hart’s critics point out, includes terror and force.

Hart also excludes law’s moral dimension from his standard of legal validity. Hart accepts “morally iniquitous” laws as legally valid. “There are no necessary conceptual connections between the content of law and morality; and hence morally iniquitous provisions may be valid as legal rules or principles. One aspect of this form of the separation of law from morality is that there can be legal rights and duties which have no moral justification or force whatever.” (Hart 1994, p. 268).

11. Radbruch

Gustav Radbruch utilizes legal history to support a validity standard invoking law’s moral dimension. Radbruch, once Germany’s leading positivist, argues that the positivist separation of law and morality facilitated Hitler’s atrocities through legal means. Radbruch argues that German positivism rendered “jurists and the people alike defenseless against arbitrary, cruel, or criminal laws, however extreme they might be. In the end, the positivistic theory equates law with power; there is law only where there is power.” (Radbruch 2006b, p. 13). Positivism, in other words, operates only in law’s political dimension.

Radbruch blames the positivistic legal thinking that held sway over German jurists for rendering impotent every possible defence against the abuses of National Socialist legislation. Radbruch warns, “We must arm ourselves against the recurrence of an outlaw state like Hitler’s by fundamentally overcoming positivism.” Radbruch’s solution is a standard of legal validity invoking law’s moral dimension. (Radbruch 2006a, p. 8).

This validity standard, known as “Radbruch’s Formula,” has been applied by German courts. In cases where the discrepancy between justice and statutory law becomes “unbearable,” the statute is held void ab initio in the interest of justice. “Radbruch’s Formula” holds such statutes void ab initio because they are not truly laws.

Radbruch explains: “Where there is not even an attempt at justice, where equality, the core of justice, is deliberately betrayed in the issuance of positive law, then the statute is not merely ‘flawed law’, it lacks completely the very nature of law. For law, including positive law, cannot be otherwise defined than as a system and an institution whose very meaning is to serve justice. Measured by this standard, whole portions of National Socialist law never attained the dignity of valid law.” (Radbruch 2006a, p. 7). Radbruch thus joins Cicero, Aquinas, and Blackstone in concluding that unjust laws are not laws at all.

12. Positivism in American Jurisprudence

Hart’s separation of law from morality stimulated significant criticism in the United States. Lon Fuller’s The Morality of Law argues that law is subject to an internal morality consisting of eight principles. Laws must be enforced, for example, in a manner consistent with their wording. Legal systems that violate these principles cannot achieve social order. They destroy any moral obligation to obey the law. (Fuller 1964, pp. 33-40).

Ronald Dworkin’s “The Model of Rules” argues that Hart’s model of law is incomplete. Courts often decide difficult cases according to legal principles that provide moral justifications for case outcomes. One example is the common law maxim that no man should profit from his own wrongful conduct. These legal principles are outside Hart’s definition of primary and secondary rules. (Dworkin 1967, pp. 23-24).

Hart’s legal positivism nevertheless exerts significant influence in American jurisprudence. Four factors enhance Hart’s influence. The first occurred in 1871 when Dean Christopher Langdell of Harvard Law School dropped Blackstone’s Commentaries from Harvard’s legal curriculum. Blackstone’s jurisprudence lost influence as other schools followed.

The second enhancing factor is the erosion of law’s moral dimension. Oliver Wendell Holmes, Jr. is a leading figure in this process. Holmes advocated for law without values and identified himself as a skeptic. Holmes defines truth as the majority vote of any nation that is more powerful than all the others. Holmes equates a jurist searching for validity criteria in natural law to the poor devil who must get drunk to satisfy his demand for the superlative. (Holmes 1918, p. 40).

Holmes’ “Path of the Law” presents an early form of positivism. Holmes argues for the separation of law and morality. Holmes supports banishing every word of moral significance from the law. He rejects every ethical obligation in contract law. Holmes advocates a “bad man” perspective that looks at law as a bad man who feels no obligation to obey it. This is an early statement of Hart’s “external point of view.” (Holmes 1997, pp. 991-997).

The third factor enhancing Hart’s influence is the erosion of law’s historical dimension. Dean Roscoe Pound of Harvard Law School illustrates its erosion. Pound’s “Mechanical Jurisprudence” advocates abandoning custom as a source of any law. Pound urged replacing the common law system based on custom with a civil code system based on statutes. (Pound 1908, 605-23).

The fourth factor enhancing Hart’s influence is the natural desire of judges to “make” new law. Blackstone’s “declaratory theory” forbids judge-made law, but Hart’s “penumbra doctrine” considers it an ordinary and necessary judicial function. One striking example of Hart’s influence is Griswold v. Connecticut, 281 U.S. 479 (1965). Griswold applies a penumbra analysis to imply a Constitutional right of privacy while admitting no such right appears in the language of the Constitution. The Supreme Court decided Roe v. Wade, 410 U.S. 113 (1973) based on Griswold’s implied right of privacy. The increased willingness of judges to legislate from the bench in 20th and 21st Century American courts is Hart’s most significant and controversial legacy in American jurisprudence.

13. A Fresh Approach

Augustine‘s City of God observes that kingdoms without justice are but great bands of robbers. Robbers become rulers, not by the removal of greed, but by the addition of impunity. (Augustine 1998, p.147-48). Validity standards are the primary means by which societies deny impunity to unjust rulers. Legal validity governs the enforceability of law, and the standard of legal validity controls the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion.

Standards of legal validity are historically cyclical, and the cycle continued in the United States during the 21st Century. American law initially embraced Blackstone’s dual validity standards based on moral principles and legal custom. Centuries of challengers have eroded those standards. Bentham, Austin, Holmes, and Hart eroded Blackstone’s moral standard by advocating the separation of law from morality. Pound eroded Blackstone’s customary standard by advocating the abandonment of common law. Legal educators dropped Blackstone from their curriculum.

These challengers eroded Blackstone’s validity standards, but they did not supplant them. A validity schism divided American jurisprudence. There was no generally accepted validity standard in American law. Academic theorists and legal educators favored Hart for his analytical clarity. Liberal judges favored Hart for increasing their power to make new law. Practitioners and conservative judges favored Blackstone for his emphasis on consent of the governed, autonomy of law, predictability of law, and morally just decisions.

Two irreconcilable bodies of precedent emerge, one formulated by traditional judges who limit themselves to finding existing law, the other by positivist judges who make new law. As judges increasingly make new law, courts become unpredictable, ex post facto rulings increase, and laws are unevenly applied. Unelected federal judges set aside democratic resolutions of political questions and decide policy issues without public input. Justices devise or limit Constitutional rights according to personal preference to achieve their desired case outcome.

Despite fifty years of debate, the opposing camps remain estranged. Each side utilizes methods its opponent will never accept. Blackstone, for example, formulates his moral precepts in terms of divine law and human reason. This formulation is unpersuasive for two reasons. First, there is no general agreement regarding the terms of divine law, and many reject its very existence. Second, Blackstone adopts inconsistent views of human reason. On one hand, human reason is too “frail, imperfect, and blind” to generate just human laws. On the other hand, human reason is sufficient to generate the precepts of natural law from revelations of divine law.

Legal positivism is unpersuasive as well, insisting on a narrow philosophical method to formulate its standard of legal validity. Hart emphasizes “a purely analytical study of legal concepts, a study of the meaning of the distinctive vocabulary of the law.” (Hart 1958, p. 601). He describes all law as consisting of only two types of rules. Hart’s simplistic model of law is inadequate for three reasons.

First, Hart’s analysis excludes law’s historical and social contexts. Hart restricts his analysis to law’s linguistic context. Law is more than linguistics. It encompasses the entirety of the great variety of human affairs. Hart’s exclusion of these indispensible contexts commits the “analytical fallacy” described by John Dewey in “Context and Thought” (Dewey 1985, pp. 5-7).

Second, Hart’s standard of legal validity ignores the content of law. Hart only considers the pedigree of the law’s creation. Hart consequently accepts the validity of “morally iniquitous laws” whose content possesses “no moral justification or force whatsoever.” (Hart 1994, p. 268).

Hart ignores the grave consequences of enforcing “morally iniquitous” laws. For example, Hart validates legal systems if two conditions are met. First, citizens may take an external point of view toward primary rules. Obedience “from any motive whatsoever” is sufficient, permitting coercion through terror. Second, officials must take an internal point of view toward secondary rules. Objectively considered, the legal systems utilized by Stalin and Hitler satisfy both conditions.

Third, Hart’s model of law as rules is incomplete. Something important is missing from a legal philosophy that validates the Soviet and Nazi legal systems. That missing element is justice, and justice is a moral concept. As Ronald Dworkin explains, courts usually decide difficult cases according to legal principles that provide moral justifications for case outcomes. Hart’s model of rules excludes these principles. (Dworkin 1967, pp. 23-24).

Hart showed how to separate law from morality, but history showed why societies should not do so. Critics contend that a fresh approach is needed.

Neither Blackstone nor Hart assign legal history a significant role in formulating their validity standards. No major jurist since Cicero has done so. Nevertheless, a historical formulation of legal validity can avoid the problems described above. Unlike Blackstone, legal history does not require belief in a divine lawgiver, and unlike Hart, legal history does not ignore the content of law.

Legal history provides a long record of legal experimentation. A scientific approach identifies three principles that recur in just and stable legal systems. Legal systems without these principles repeatedly become arbitrary, unjust, and unstable.

The first principle is the principle of reason, which addresses the validity of law’s content. The principle of reason recognizes that every subject is a rational creature with a free will. To be stable, the legal system must treat its subjects as ends in themselves, and not as a mere means to another end. The legal system must also permit rational individuals to orient their own behavior in order to achieve a society based on ordered liberty. Procedural due process protects against the punishment of the innocent and the tyranny of the majority. Substantive due process enables laws to provide dependable guideposts to individuals in orienting their behavior.

The second principle is the principle of consent, which addresses the validity of law’s creation. This principle provides that the legitimacy of law derives from the consent of those subject to its power. Common law custom, the doctrine of stare decisis, and legislation sanctioned by the subjects’ legitimate representatives are all evidence of consent.

The third principle is the principle of autonomy, which addresses both the content and the creation of law. Laws must wield supremacy over political rulers. The ruler must be under the same laws as his subjects, and the laws must not be subject to arbitrary change to reflect the ruler’s will. To paraphrase de Bracton, the law must make the king. The king must not make the law. To paraphrase Aristotle, rightly constituted laws must be the final sovereign.

These principles operate in law’s moral and historical dimensions to restrain the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion. Legal systems become unjust and unstable in the absence of such restraints. They project the power of the political ruler, but they are not valid legal systems. The history of the Western legal tradition is the history of revolutions against such systems. (Berman 1983).

14. References and Further Reading

Aquinas, Thomas. Treatise on Law (Summa Theologica, Questions 90-07). Ed. Ralph McInerny. Washington: Regnery, 1996. Print.
Aristotle. The Athenian Constitution. Trans. Sir Frederic G. Kenyon. Seaside, OR: Merchant, 2009. Print.
Aristotlte. Ethica Nichomachea. Trans. W.D. Ross. New York: Oxford UP, 2009. Print.
Aristotlte. Metaphysics. Trans. Joe Sachs. Santa Fe: Green Lion, 2002. Print.
Aristotlte. Physics. Trans. Robin Waterfield. Ed. David Bostock. Oxford: Oxford UP, 1996. Print.
Aristotlte. The Politics of Aristotle. Trans. Ernest Barker. Oxford: Oxford UP, 1946. Print.
Aristotlte. Rhetoric. Ed. W.D. Ross. Trans. W. Rhys Roberts. New York: Cosimo, 2010. Print.
Augustine. The City of God against the Pagans. Trans. R.W. Dyson. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1998. Print.
Austin, John. The Province of Jurisprudence Determined. Amherst, NY: Prometheus, 2000. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. “Anarchical Fallacies; Being an Examination of the Declarations of Rights Issued During the French Revolution.” The Works of Jeremy Bentham. 11 vols. Edinburgh: William Tait, 1838-43. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. A Comment on the Commentaries and A Fragment on Government. Ed. J.H. Burns and H.L.A. Hart. London: Athlone, 1977. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Oxford: Clarendon, 1907. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. Of Laws in General. Ed. H.L.A. Hart. London: Athlone, 1970. Print.
Berman, Harold J. Law and Revolution: The Formation of the Western Legal Tradition. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1983. Print.
Berman, Harold J. “Toward an Integrative Jurisprudence: Politics, Morality, History.” 76 (4) California Law Review (1988): 779-801. Print.
Blackstone, Sir William. Commentaries on the Laws of England. Vol. 1. New York: W.E. Dean, 1838. Print.
Cicero, De Officis (On Duties). Ed. M.T. Griffin and E.M. Atkins. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1991. Print.
Cicero, De Re Publica (On the Republic) and De Legibus (On the Laws). Trans. C.W. Keyes. Ed. Jeffrey Henderson. Bury St. Edmonds, UK: St. Edmondsbury, 2000. Print.
De Bracton, Henry. De Legibus et Consuetudinibus Angliae (On the Laws and Customs of England). Ed. George E. Woodbine. Trans. Samuel E. Thorne. 4 vols. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1968. Print.
Dewey, John. “Context and Thought.” The Later Works of John Dewey. Ed. Jo Ann Boydston. Vol. 6. Carbondale, IL: S. Illinois UP, 1985. Print.
Dworkin, Ronald. “The Model of Rules.” U. Chi. L. Rev. 35 (1) (1967): 14-46. Print.
Fuller, Lon L. The Morality of Law. New Haven: Yale UP, 1964. Print.
Hamilton, Alexander, John Jay, and James Madison. “Federalist No. 63.” The Federalist Papers. Ed. Ernest O’Dell. Sundown, TX: CreateSpace, 2010. Print.
Hart, H. L. A. The Concept of Law. 2nd ed. Oxford: Clarendon, 1994. Print.
Hart, H. L. A. “Positivism and the Separation of Law and Morals.” Harv. L Rev. 71 (4) (1958): 593–629. Print.
Hesiod. Theogony, Works and Days, Shield. Trans. Apostolos N. Athanassakis. 2nd ed. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins Press, 2004. Print.
Holmes, Oliver Wendell, Jr. “Natural Law.” Harv. L. Rev. 32 (1) (1918): 40-44. Print.
Holmes, Oliver Wendell, Jr. “The Path of the Law.” Harv. L. Rev. 110 (5) (1997): 991-1009. Print.
Justinian. Corpus Juris Civilis, The Civil Law. Trans. S.P. Scott. 17 vols. Cincinnati: Central Trust, 1932. Print.
Plato. Crito. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Protagoras. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Gorgias. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. “Letter VII.” The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Laws. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Theaetetus. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. The Republic. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plutarch. “Themistocles.” Plutarch’s Lives. Trans. Bernadotte Perrin. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1914. Print.
Pound, Roscoe. “Mechanical Jurisprudence.” Colum. L. Rev. 8 (3) (1908): 605-623. Print.
Radbruch, Gustav. “Five Minutes of Legal Philosophy.” Trans. Bonnie Litschewski Paulson and Stanley L. Paulson. Oxford J. Legal Stud. 26 (1) (2006b): 13-15. Print.
Radbruch, Gustav. “Statutory Lawlessness and Supra-Statutory Law.” Trans. Bonnie Litschewski Paulson and Stanley L. Paulson. Oxford J. Legal Stud. 26 (1) (2006a): 1-11. Print.
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Author Information

John O. Tyler, Jr.
Email: jtyler@hbu.edu
Houston Baptist University
U. S. A.

Socrates (469—399 B.C.E.)

Socrates is one of the few individuals whom one could say has so-shaped the cultural and intellectual development of the world that, without him, history would be profoundly different. He is best known for his association with the Socratic method of question and answer, his claim that he was ignorant (or aware of his own absence of knowledge), and his claim that the unexamined life is not worth living, for human beings. He was the inspiration for Plato, the thinker widely held to be the founder of the Western philosophical tradition. Plato in turn served as the teacher of Aristotle, thus establishing the famous triad of ancient philosophers: Socrates, Plato, and Aristotle. Unlike other philosophers of his time and ours, Socrates never wrote anything down but was committed to living simply and to interrogating the everyday views and popular opinions of those in his home city of Athens. At the age of 70, he was put to death at the hands of his fellow citizens on charges of impiety and corruption of the youth. His trial, along with the social and political context in which occurred, has warranted as much treatment from historians and classicists as his arguments and methods have from philosophers.

This article gives an overview of Socrates: who he was, what he thought, and his purported method. It is both historical and philosophical. At the same time, it contains reflections on the difficult nature of knowing anything about a person who never committed any of his ideas to the written word. Much of what is known about Socrates comes to us from Plato, although Socrates appears in the works of other ancient writers as well as those who follow Plato in the history of philosophy. This article recognizes that finding the original Socrates may be impossible, but it attempts to achieve a close approximation.

Biography: Who was Socrates?
1. The Historical Socrates
  1. Birth and Early Life
  2. Later Life and Trial
    1. The Peloponnesian War and the Threat to Democracy
    2. Greek Religion and Socrates’ Impiety
2. The Socratic Problem: the Philosophical Socrates
Content: What does Socrates Think?
Method: How Did Socrates Do Philosophy?
Legacy: How Have Other Philosophers Understood Socrates?
1. Hellenistic Philosophy
2. Modern Philosophy
  1. Hegel
  2. Kierkegaard
  3. Nietzsche
  4. Heidegger
  5. Gadamer
References and Further Reading

1. Biography: Who was Socrates?

a. The Historical Socrates

i. Birth and Early Life

Socrates was born in Athens in the year 469 B.C.E. to Sophroniscus, a stonemason, and Phaenarete, a midwife. His family was not extremely poor, but they were by no means wealthy, and Socrates could not claim that he was of noble birth like Plato. He grew up in the political deme or district of Alopece, and when he turned 18, began to perform the typical political duties required of Athenian males. These included compulsory military service and membership in the Assembly, the governing body responsible for determining military strategy and legislation.

In a culture that worshipped male beauty, Socrates had the misfortune of being born incredibly ugly. Many of our ancient sources attest to his rather awkward physical appearance, and Plato more than once makes reference to it (Theaetetus 143e, Symposium, 215a-c; also Xenophon Symposium 4.19, 5.5-7 and Aristophanes Clouds 362). Socrates was exophthalmic, meaning that his eyes bulged out of his head and were not straight but focused sideways. He had a snub nose, which made him resemble a pig, and many sources depict him with a potbelly. Socrates did little to help his odd appearance, frequently wearing the same cloak and sandals throughout both the day and the evening. Plato’s Symposium (174a) offers us one of the few accounts of his caring for his appearance.

As a young man Socrates was given an education appropriate for a person of his station. By the middle of the 5^th century B.C.E., all Athenian males were taught to read and write. Sophroniscus, however, also took pains to give his son an advanced cultural education in poetry, music, and athletics. In both Plato and Xenophon, we find a Socrates that is well versed in poetry, talented at music, and quite at-home in the gymnasium. In accordance with Athenian custom, his father also taught him a trade, though Socrates did not labor at it on a daily basis. Rather, he spent his days in the agora (the Athenian marketplace), asking questions of those who would speak with him. While he was poor, he quickly acquired a following of rich young aristocrats—one of whom was Plato—who particularly enjoyed hearing him interrogate those that were purported to be the wisest and most influential men in the city.

Socrates was married to Xanthippe, and according to some sources, had a second wife. Most suggest that he first married Xanthippe, and that she gave birth to his first son, Lamprocles. He is alleged to have married his second wife, Myrto, without dowry, and she gave birth to his other two sons, Sophroniscus and Menexenus. Various accounts attribute Sophroniscus to Xanthippe, while others even suggest that Socrates was married to both women simultaneously because of a shortage of males in Athens at the time. In accordance with Athenian custom, Socrates was open about his physical attraction to young men, though he always subordinated his physical desire for them to his desire that they improve the condition of their souls.

Socrates fought valiantly during his time in the Athenian military. Just before the Peloponnesian War with Sparta began in 431 B.C.E, he helped the Athenians win the battle of Potidaea (432 B.C.E.), after which he saved the life of Alcibiades, the famous Athenian general. He also fought as one of 7,000 hoplites aside 20,000 troops at the battle of Delium (424 B.C.E.) and once more at the battle of Amphipolis (422 B.C.E.). Both battles were defeats for Athens.

Despite his continued service to his city, many members of Athenian society perceived Socrates to be a threat to their democracy, and it is this suspicion that largely contributed to his conviction in court. It is therefore imperative to understand the historical context in which his trial was set.

ii. Later Life and Trial

1. The Peloponnesian War and the Threat to Democracy

Between 431—404 B.C.E. Athens fought one of its bloodiest and most protracted conflicts with neighboring Sparta, the war that we now know as the Peloponnesian War. Aside from the fact that Socrates fought in the conflict, it is important for an account of his life and trial because many of those with whom Socrates spent his time became either sympathetic to the Spartan cause at the very least or traitors to Athens at worst. This is particularly the case with those from the more aristocratic Athenian families, who tended to favor the rigid and restricted hierarchy of power in Sparta instead of the more widespread democratic distribution of power and free speech to all citizens that obtained in Athens. Plato more than once places in the mouth of his character Socrates praise for Sparta (Protagoras 342b, Crito 53a; cf. Republic 544c in which most people think the Spartan constitution is the best). The political regime of the Republic is marked by a small group of ruling elites that preside over the citizens of the ideal city.

There are a number of important historical moments throughout the war leading up to Socrates’ trial that figure in the perception of him as a traitor. Seven years after the battle of Amphipolis, the Athenian navy was set to invade the island of Sicily, when a number of statues in the city called “herms”, dedicated to the god Hermes, protector of travelers, were destroyed. Dubbed the ‘Mutilation of the Herms’ (415 B.C.E.), this event engendered not only a fear of those who might seek to undermine the democracy, but those who did not respect the gods. In conjunction with these crimes, Athens witnessed the profanation of the Eleusinian mysteries, religious rituals that were to be conducted only in the presence of priests but that were in this case performed in private homes without official sanction or recognition of any kind. Amongst those accused and persecuted on suspicion of involvement in the crimes were a number of Socrates’ associates, including Alcibiades, who was recalled from his position leading the expedition in Sicily. Rather than face prosecution for the crime, Alcibiades escaped and sought asylum in Sparta.

Though Alcibiades was not the only of Socrates’ associates implicated in the sacrilegious crimes (Charmides and Critias were suspected as well), he is arguably the most important. Socrates had by many counts been in love with Alcibiades and Plato depicts him pursuing or speaking of his love for him in many dialogues (Symposium 213c-d, Protagoras 309a, Gorgias 481d, Alcibiades I 103a-104c, 131e-132a). Alcibiades is typically portrayed as a wandering soul (Alcibiades I 117c-d), not committed to any one consistent way of life or definition of justice. Instead, he was a kind of cameleon-like flatterer that could change and mold himself in order to please crowds and win political favor (Gorgias 482a). In 411 B.C.E., a group of citizens opposed to the Athenian democracy led a coup against the government in hopes of establishing an oligarchy. Though the democrats put down the coup later that year and recalled Alcibiades to lead the Athenian fleet in the Hellespont, he aided the oligarchs by securing for them an alliance with the Persian satraps. Alcibiades therefore did not just aid the Spartan cause but allied himself with Persian interests as well. His association with the two principal enemies of Athens reflected poorly on Socrates, and Xenophon tells us that Socrates’ repeated association with and love for Alcibiades was instrumental in the suspicion that he was a Spartan apologist.

Sparta finally defeated Athens in 404 B.C.E., just five years before Socrates’ trial and execution. Instead of a democracy, they installed as rulers a small group of Athenians who were loyal to Spartan interests. Known as “The Thirty” or sometimes as the “Thirty Tyrants”, they were led by Critias, a known associate of Socrates and a member of his circle. Critias’ nephew Charmides, about whom we have a Platonic dialogue of the same name, was also a member. Though Critias put forth a law prohibiting Socrates from conducting discussions with young men under the age of 30, Socrates’ earlier association with him—as well as his willingness to remain in Athens and endure the rule of the Thirty rather than flee—further contributed to the growing suspicion that Socrates was opposed to the democratic ideals of his city.

The Thirty ruled tyrannically—executing a number of wealthy Athenians as well as confiscating their property, arbitrarily arresting those with democratic sympathies, and exiling many others—until they were overthrown in 403 B.C.E. by a group of democratic exiles returning to the city. Both Critias and Charmides were killed and, after a Spartan-sponsored peace accord, the democracy was restored. The democrats proclaimed a general amnesty in the city and thereby prevented politically motivated legal prosecutions aimed at redressing the terrible losses incurred during the reign of the Thirty. Their hope was to maintain unity during the reestablishment of their democracy.

One of Socrates’ main accusers, Anytus, was one of the democratic exiles that returned to the city to assist in the overthrow of the Thirty. Plato’s Meno, set in the year 402 B.C.E., imagines a conversation between Socrates and Anytus in which the latter argues that any citizen of Athens can teach virtue, an especially democratic view insofar as it assumes knowledge of how to live well is not the restricted domain of the esoteric elite or privileged few. In the discussion, Socrates argues that if one wants to know about virtue, one should consult an expert on virtue (Meno 91b-94e). The political turmoil of the city, rebuilding itself as a democracy after nearly thirty years of destruction and bloodshed, constituted a context in which many citizens were especially fearful of threats to their democracy that came not from the outside, but from within their own city.

While many of his fellow citizens found considerable evidence against Socrates, there was also historical evidence in addition to his military service for the case that he was not just a passive but an active supporter of the democracy. For one thing, just as he had associates that were known oligarchs, he also had associates that were supporters of the democracy, including the metic family of Cephalus and Socrates’ friend Chaerephon, the man who reported that the oracle at Delphi had proclaimed that no man was wiser than Socrates. Additionally, when he was ordered by the Thirty to help retrieve the democratic general Leon from the island of Salamis for execution, he refused to do so. His refusal could be understood not as the defiance of a legitimately established government but rather his allegiance to the ideals of due process that were in effect under the previously instituted democracy. Indeed, in Plato’s Crito, Socrates refuses to escape from prison on the grounds that he lived his whole life with an implied agreement with the laws of the democracy (Crito 50a-54d). Notwithstanding these facts, there was profound suspicion that Socrates was a threat to the democracy in the years after the end of the Peloponnesian War. But because of the amnesty, Anytus and his fellow accusers Meletus and Lycon were prevented from bringing suit against Socrates on political grounds. They opted instead for religious grounds.

2. Greek Religion and Socrates’ Impiety

Because of the amnesty the charges made against Socrates were framed in religious terms. As recounted by Diogenes Laertius (1.5.40), the charges were stated as follows: “Socrates does criminal wrong by not recognizing the gods that the city recognizes, and furthermore by introducing new divinities; and he also does criminal wrong by corrupting the youth” (other accounts: Xenophon Memorabilia I.I.1 and Apology 11-12, Plato, Apology 24b and Euthyphro 2c-3b). Many people understood the charge about corrupting the youth to signify that Socrates taught his subversive views to others, a claim that he adamantly denies in his defense speech by claiming that he has no wisdom to teach (Plato, Apology 20c) and that he cannot be held responsible for the actions of those that heard him speak (Plato, Apology 33a-c).

It is now customary to refer to the principal written accusation on the deposition submitted to the Athenian court as an accusation of impiety, or unholiness. Rituals, ceremonies, and sacrifices that were officially sanctioned by the city and its officials marked ancient Greek religion. The sacred was woven into the everyday experience of citizens who demonstrated their piety by correctly observing their ancestral traditions. Interpretation of the gods at their temples was the exclusive domain of priests appointed and recognized by the city. The boundary and separation between the religious and the secular that we find in many countries today therefore did not obtain in Athens. A religious crime was consequently an offense not just against the gods, but also against the city itself.

Socrates and his contemporaries lived in a polytheistic society, a society in which the gods did not create the world but were themselves created. Socrates would have been brought up with the stories of the gods recounted in Hesiod and Homer, in which the gods were not omniscient, omnibenevolent, or eternal, but rather power-hungry super-creatures that regularly intervened in the affairs of human beings. One thinks for example of Aphrodite saving Paris from death at the hands of Menelaus (Homer, Iliad 3.369-382) or Zeus sending Apollo to rescue the corpse of Sarpedon after his death in battle (Homer, Iliad 16.667-684). Human beings were to fear the gods, sacrifice to them, and honor them with festivals and prayers.

Socrates instead seemed to have a conception of the divine as always benevolent, truthful, authoritative, and wise. For him, divinity always operated in accordance with the standards of rationality. This conception of divinity, however, dispenses with the traditional conception of prayer and sacrifice as motivated by hopes for material payoff. Socrates’ theory of the divine seemed to make the most important rituals and sacrifices in the city entirely useless, for if the gods are all good, they will benefit human beings regardless of whether or not human beings make offerings to them. Jurors at his trial might have thought that, without the expectation of material reward or protection from the gods, Socrates was disconnecting religion from its practical roots and its connection with the civic identity of the city.

While Socrates was critical of blind acceptance of the gods and the myths we find in Hesiod and Homer, this in itself was not unheard of in Athens at the time. Solon, Xenophanes, Heraclitus, and Euripides had all spoken against the capriciousness and excesses of the gods without incurring penalty. It is possible to make the case that Socrates’ jurors might not have indicted him solely on questioning the gods or even of interrogating the true meaning of piety. Indeed, there was no legal definition of piety in Athens at the time, and jurors were therefore in a similar situation to the one in which we find Socrates in Plato’s Euthyphro, that is, in need of an inquiry into what the nature of piety truly is. What seems to have concerned the jurors was not only Socrates’ challenge to the traditional interpretation of the gods of the city, but his seeming allegiance to an entirely novel divine being, unfamiliar to anyone in the city.

This new divine being is what is known as Socrates’ daimon. Though it has become customary to think of a daimon as a spirit or quasi-divinity (for example, Symposium 202e-203a), in ancient Greek religion it was not solely a specific class of divine being but rather a mode of activity, a force that drives a person when no particular divine agent can be named (Burkett, 180). Socrates claimed to have heard a sign or voice from his days as a child that accompanied him and forbid him to pursue certain courses of action (Plato, Apology 31c-d, 40a-b, Euthydemus 272e-273a, Euthyphro 3b, Phaedrus 242b, Theages 128-131a, Theaetetus 150c-151b, Rep 496c; Xenophon, Apology 12, Memorabilia 1.1.3-5). Xenophon adds that the sign also issued positive commands (Memorablia 1.1.4, 4.3.12, 4.8.1, Apology 12). This sign was accessible only to Socrates, private and internal to his own mind. Whether Socrates received moral knowledge of any sort from the sign is a matter of scholarly debate, but beyond doubt is the strangeness of Socrates’ insistence that he took private instructions from a deity that was unlicensed by the city. For all the jurors knew, the deity could have been hostile to Athenian interests. Socrates’ daimon was therefore extremely influential in his indictment on the charge of worshipping new gods unknown to the city (Plato, Euthyphro 3b, Xenophon, Memorabilia I.1.2).

Whereas in Plato’s Apology Socrates makes no attempt to reconcile his divine sign with traditional views of piety, Xenophon’s Socrates argues that just as there are those who rely on birdcalls and receive guidance from voices, so he too is influenced by his daimon. However, Socrates had no officially sanctioned religious role in the city. As such, his attempt to assimilate himself to a seer or necromancer appointed by the city to interpret divine signs actually may have undermined his innocence, rather than help to establish it. His insistence that he had direct, personal access to the divine made him appear guilty to enough jurors that he was sentenced to death.

b. The Socratic Problem: the Philosophical Socrates

The Socratic problem is the problem faced by historians of philosophy when attempting to reconstruct the ideas of the original Socrates as distinct from his literary representations. While we know many of the historical details of Socrates’ life and the circumstances surrounding his trial, Socrates’ identity as a philosopher is much more difficult to establish. Because he wrote nothing, what we know of his ideas and methods comes to us mainly from his contemporaries and disciples.

There were a number of Socrates’ followers who wrote conversations in which he appears. These works are what are known as the logoi sokratikoi, or Socratic accounts. Aside from Plato and Xenophon, most of these dialogues have not survived. What we know of them comes to us from other sources. For example, very little survives from the dialogues of Antisthenes, whom Xenophon reports as one of Socrates’ leading disciples. Indeed, from polemics written by the rhetor Isocrates, some scholars have concluded that he was the most prominent Socratic in Athens for the first decade following Socrates’ death. Diogenes Laertius (6.10-13) attributes to Antisthenes a number of views that we recognize as Socratic, including that virtue is sufficient for happiness, the wise man is self-sufficient, only the virtuous are noble, the virtuous are friends, and good things are morally fine and bad things are base.

Aeschines of Sphettus wrote seven dialogues, all of which have been lost. It is possible for us to reconstruct the plots of two of them: the Alcibiades—in which Socrates shames Alcibiades into admitting he needs Socrates’ help to be virtuous—and the Aspasia—in which Socrates recommends the famous wife of Pericles as a teacher for the son of Callias. Aeschines’ dialogues focus on Socrates’ ability to help his interlocutor acquire self-knowledge and better himself.

Phaedo of Elis wrote two dialogues. His central use of Socrates is to show that philosophy can improve anyone regardless of his social class or natural talents. Euclides of Megara wrote six dialogues, about which we know only their titles. Diogenes Laertius reports that he held that the good is one, that insight and prudence are different names for the good, and that what is opposed to the good does not exist. All three are Socratic themes. Lastly, Aristippus of Cyrene wrote no Socratic dialogues but is alleged to have written a work entitled To Socrates.

The two Socratics on whom most of our philosophical understanding of Socrates depends are Plato and Xenophon. Scholars also rely on the works of the comic playwright Aristophanes and Plato’s most famous student, Aristotle.

i. Origin of the Socratic Problem

The Socratic problem first became pronounced in the early 19^th century with the influential work of Friedrich Schleiermacher. Until this point, scholars had largely turned to Xenophon to identify what the historical Socrates thought. Schleiermacher argued that Xenophon was not a philosopher but rather a simple citizen-soldier, and that his Socrates was so dull and philosophically uninteresting that, reading Xenophon alone, it would be difficult to understand the reputation accorded Socrates by so many of his contemporaries and nearly all the schools of philosophy that followed him. The better portrait of Socrates, Schleiermacher claimed, comes to us from Plato.

Though many scholars have since jettisoned Xenophon as a legitimate source for representing the philosophical views of the historical Socrates, they remain divided over the reliability of the other three sources. For one thing, Aristophanes was a comic playwright, and therefore took considerable poetic license when scripting his characters. Aristotle, born 15 years after Socrates’ death, hears about Socrates primarily from Plato. Plato himself wrote dialogues or philosophical dramas, and thus cannot be understood to be presenting his readers with exact replicas or transcriptions of conversations that Socrates actually had. Furthermore, many scholars think that Plato’s so-called middle and late dialogues do not present the views of the historical Socrates.

We therefore see the difficult nature of the Socratic problem: because we don’t seem to have any consistently reliable sources, finding the true Socrates or the original Socrates proves to be an impossible task. What we are left with, instead, is a composite picture assembled from various literary and philosophical components that give us what we might think of as Socratic themes or motifs.

ii. Aristophanes

Born in 450 B.C.E., Aristophanes wrote a number of comic plays intended to satirize and caricature many of his fellow Athenians. His Clouds (423 B.C.E.) was so instrumental in parodying Socrates and painting him as a dangerous intellectual capable of corrupting the entire city that Socrates felt compelled in his trial defense to allude to the bad reputation he acquired as a result of the play (Plato, Apology 18a-b, 19c). Aristophanes was much closer in age to Socrates than Plato and Xenophon, and as such is the only one of our sources exposed to Socrates in his younger years.

In the play, Socrates is the head of a phrontistêrion, a school of learning where students are taught the nature of the heavens and how to win court cases. Socrates appears in a swing high above the stage, purportedly to better study the heavens. His patron deities, the clouds, represent his interest in meteorology and may also symbolize the lofty nature of reasoning that may take either side of an argument. The main plot of the play centers on an indebted man called Strepsiades, whose son Phidippides ends up in the school to learn how to help his father avoid paying off his debts. By the end of the play, Phidippides has beaten his father, arguing that it is perfectly reasonable to do so on the grounds that, just as it is acceptable for a father to spank his son for his own good, so it is acceptable for a son to hit a father for his own good. In addition to the theme that Socrates corrupts the youth, we therefore also find in the Clouds the origin of the rumor that Socrates makes the stronger argument the weaker and the weaker argument the stronger. Indeed, the play features a personification of the Stronger Argument—which represents traditional education and values—attacked by the Weaker Argument—which advocates a life of pleasure.

While the Clouds is Aristophanes’ most famous and comprehensive attack on Socrates, Socrates appears in other of his comedies as well. In the Birds (414 B.C.E.), Aristophanes coins a Greek verb based on Socrates’ name to insinuate that Socrates was truly a Spartan sympathizer (1280-83). Young men who were found “Socratizing” were expressing their admiration of Sparta and its customs. And in the Frogs (405), the Chorus claims that it is not refined to keep company with Socrates, who ignores the poets and wastes time with ‘frivolous words’ and ‘pompous word-scraping’ (1491-1499).

Aristophanes’ Socrates is a kind of variegated caricature of trends and new ideas emerging in Athens that he believed were threatening to the city. We find a number of such themes prevalent in Presocratic philosophy and the teachings of the Sophists, including those about natural science, mathematics, social science, ethics, political philosophy, and the art of words. Amongst other things, Aristophanes was troubled by the displacement of the divine through scientific explanations of the world and the undermining of traditional morality and custom by explanations of cultural life that appealed to nature instead of the gods. Additionally, he was reticent about teaching skill in disputation, for fear that a clever speaker could just as easily argue for the truth as argue against it. These issues constitute what is sometimes called the “new learning” developing in 5^th century B.C.E. Athens, for which the Aristophanic Socrates is the iconic symbol.

iii. Xenophon

Born in the same decade as Plato (425 B.C.E.), Xenophon lived in the political deme of Erchia. Though he knew Socrates he would not have had as much contact with him as Plato did. He was not present in the courtroom on the day of Socrates’ trial, but rather heard an account of it later on from Hermogenes, a member of Socrates’ circle. His depiction of Socrates is found principally in four works: Apology—in which Socrates gives a defense of his life before his jurors—Memorabilia—in which Xenophon himself explicates the charges against Socrates and tries to defend him—Symposium—a conversation between Socrates and his friends at a drinking party—and Oeconomicus—a Socratic discourse on estate management. Socrates also appears in Xenophon’s Hellenica and Anabasis.

Xenophon’s reputation as a source on the life and ideas of Socrates is one on which scholars do not always agree. Largely thought to be a significant source of information about Socrates before the 19^th century, for most of the 20^th century Xenophon’s ability to depict Socrates as a philosopher was largely called into question. Following Schleiermacher, many argued that Xenophon himself was either a bad philosopher who did not understand Socrates, or not a philosopher at all, more concerned with practical, everyday matters like economics. However, recent scholarship has sought to challenge this interpretation, arguing that it assumes an understanding of philosophy as an exclusively speculative and critical endeavor that does not attend to the ancient conception of philosophy as a comprehensive way of life.

While Plato will likely always remain the principal source on Socrates and Socratic themes, Xenophon’s Socrates is distinct in philosophically interesting ways. He emphasizes the values of self-mastery (enkrateia), endurance of physical pain (karteria), and self-sufficiency (autarkeia). For Xenophon’s Socrates, self-mastery or moderation is the foundation of virtue (Memorabilia, 1.5.4). Whereas in Plato’s Apology the oracle tells Chaerephon that no one is wiser than Socrates, in Xenophon’s Apology Socrates claims that the oracle told Chaerephon that “no man was more free than I, more just, and more moderate” (Xenophon, Apology, 14).

Part of Socrates’ freedom consists in his freedom from want, precisely because he has mastered himself. As opposed to Plato’s Socrates, Xenophon’s Socrates is not poor, not because he has much, but because he needs little. Oeconomicus 11.3 for instance shows Socrates displeased with those who think him poor. One can be rich even with very little on the condition that one has limited his needs, for wealth is just the excess of what one has over what one requires. Socrates is rich because what he has is sufficient for what he needs (Memorabilia 1.2.1, 1.3.5, 4.2.38-9).

We also find Xenophon attributing to Socrates a proof of the existence of God. The argument holds that human beings are the product of an intelligent design, and we therefore should conclude that there is a God who is the maker (dēmiourgos) or designer of all things (Memorabilia 1.4.2-7). God creates a systematically ordered universe and governs it in the way our minds govern our bodies (Memorabilia 1.4.1-19, 4.3.1-18). While Plato’s Timaeus tells the story of a dēmiourgos creating the world, it is Timaeus, not Socrates, who tells the story. Indeed, Socrates speaks only sparingly at the beginning of the dialogue, and most scholars do not count as Socratic the cosmological arguments therein.

iv. Plato

Plato was Socrates’ most famous disciple, and the majority of what most people know about Socrates is known about Plato’s Socrates. Plato was born to one of the wealthiest and politically influential families in Athens in 427 B.C.E., the son of Ariston and Perictione. His brothers were Glaucon and Adeimantus, who are Socrates’ principal interlocutors for the majority of the Republic. Though Socrates is not present in every Platonic dialogue, he is in the majority of them, often acting as the main interlocutor who drives the conversation.

The attempt to extract Socratic views from Plato’s texts is itself a notoriously difficult problem, bound up with questions about the order in which Plato composed his dialogues, one’s methodological approach to reading them, and whether or not Socrates, or anyone else for that matter, speaks for Plato. Readers interested in the details of this debate should consult “Plato.” Generally speaking, the predominant view of Plato’s Socrates in the English-speaking world from the middle to the end of the 20^th century was simply that he was Plato’s mouthpiece. In other words, anything Socrates says in the dialogues is what Plato thought at the time he wrote the dialogue. This view, put forth by the famous Plato scholar Gregory Vlastos, has been challenged in recent years, with some scholars arguing that Plato has no mouthpiece in the dialogues (see Cooper xxi-xxiii). While we can attribute to Plato certain doctrines that are consistent throughout his corpus, there is no reason to think that Socrates, or any other speaker, always and consistently espouses these doctrines.

The main interpretive obstacle for those seeking the views of Socrates from Plato is the question of the order of the dialogues. Thrasyllus, the 1^st century (C.E.) Platonist who was the first to arrange the dialogues according to a specific paradigm, organized the dialogues into nine tetralogies, or groups of four, on the basis of the order in which he believed they should be read. Another approach, customary for most scholars by the late 20^th century, groups the dialogues into three categories on the basis of the order in which Plato composed them. Plato begins his career, so the narrative goes, representing his teacher Socrates in typically short conversations about ethics, virtue, and the best human life. These are “early” dialogues. Only subsequently does Plato develop his own philosophical views—the most famous of which is the doctrine of the Forms or Ideas—that Socrates defends. These “middle” dialogues put forth positive doctrines that are generally thought to be Platonic and not Socratic. Finally, towards the end of his life, Plato composes dialogues in which Socrates typically either hardly features at all or is altogether absent. These are the “late” dialogues.

There are a number of complications with this interpretive thesis, and many of them focus on the portrayal of Socrates. Though the Gorgias is an early dialogue, Socrates concludes the dialogue with a myth that some scholars attribute to a Pythagorean influence on Plato that he would not have had during Socrates’ lifetime. Though the Parmenides is a middle dialogue, the younger Socrates speaks only at the beginning before Parmenides alone speaks for the remainder of the dialogue. While the Philebus is a late dialogue, Socrates is the main speaker. Some scholars identify the Meno as an early dialogue because Socrates refutes Meno’s attempts to articulate the nature of virtue. Others, focusing on Socrates’ use of the theory of recollection and the method of hypothesis, argue that it is a middle dialogue. Finally, while Plato’s most famous work the Republic is a middle dialogue, some scholars make a distinction within the Republic itself. The first book, they argue, is Socratic, because in it we find Socrates refuting Thrasymachus’ definition of justice while maintaining that he knows nothing about justice. The rest of the dialogue they claim, with its emphasis on the division of the soul and the metaphysics of the Forms, is Platonic.

To discern a consistent Socrates in Plato is therefore a difficult task. Instead of speaking about chronology of composition, contemporary scholars searching for views that are likely to have been associated with the historical Socrates generally focus on a group of dialogues that are united by topical similarity. These “Socratic dialogues” feature Socrates as the principal speaker, challenging his interlocutor to elaborate on and critically examine his own views while typically not putting forth substantive claims of his own. These dialogues—including those that some scholars think are not written by Plato and those that most scholars agree are not written by Plato but that Thrasyllus included in his collection—are as follows: Euthyphro, Apology, Crito, Alcibiades I, Alcibiades II, Hipparchus, Rival Lovers, Theages, Charmides, Laches, Lysis, Euthydemus, Protagoras, Gorgias, Meno, Greater Hippias, Lesser Hippias, Ion, Menexenus, Clitophon, Minos. Some of the more famous positions Socrates defends in these dialogues are covered in the content section.

v. Aristotle

Aristotle was born in 384 B.C.E., 15 years after the death of Socrates. At the age of eighteen, he went to study at Plato’s Academy, and remained there for twenty years. Afterwards, he traveled throughout Asia and was invited by Phillip II of Macedon to tutor his son Alexander, known to history as Alexander the Great. While Aristotle would never have had the chance to meet Socrates, we have in his writings an account of both Socrates’ method and the topics about which he had conversations. Given the likelihood that Aristotle heard about Socrates from Plato and those at his Academy, it is not surprising that most of what he says about Socrates follows the depiction of him in the Platonic dialogues.

Aristotle related four concrete points about Socrates. The first is that Socrates asked questions without supplying an answer of his own, because he claimed to know nothing (De Elenchis Sophisticus 1836b6-8). The picture of Socrates here is consistent with that of Plato’s Apology. Second, Aristotle claims that Socrates never asked questions about nature, but concerned himself only with ethical questions. Aristotle thus attributes to the historical Socrates both the method and topics we find in Plato’s Socratic dialogues.

Third, Aristotle claims that Socrates is the first to have employed epagōgē, a word typically rendered in English as “induction.” This translation, however, is misleading, lest we impute to Socrates a preference for inductive reasoning as opposed to deductive reasoning. The term better indicates that Socrates was fond or arguing via the use of analogy. For instance, just as a doctor does not practice medicine for himself but for the best interest of his patient, so the ruler in the city takes no account of his own personal profit, but is rather interested in caring for his citizens (Republic 342d-e).

The fourth and final claim Aristotle makes about Socrates itself has two parts. First, Socrates was the first to ask the question, ti esti: what is it? For example, if someone were to suggest to Socrates that our children should grow up to be courageous, he would ask, what is courage? That is, what is the universal definition or nature that holds for all examples of courage? Second, as distinguished from Plato, Socrates did not separate universals from their particular instantiations. For Plato, the noetic object, the knowable thing, is the separate universal, not the particular. Socrates simply asked the “what is it” question (on this and the previous two points, see Metaphysics I.6.987a29-b14; cf. b22-24, b27-33, and see XIII.4.1078b12-34).

2. Content: What does Socrates Think?

Given the nature of these sources, the task of recounting what Socrates thought is not an easy one. Nonetheless, reading Plato’s Apology, it is possible to articulate a number of what scholars today typically associate with Socrates. Plato the author has his Socrates claim that Plato was present in the courtroom for Socrates’ defense (Apology 34a), and while this cannot mean that Plato records the defense as a word for word transcription, it is the closest thing we have to an account of what Socrates actually said at a concrete point in his life.

a. Presocratic Philosophy and the Sophists

Socrates opens his defense speech by defending himself against his older accusers (Apology 18a), claiming they have poisoned the minds of his jurors since they were all young men. Amongst these accusers was Aristophanes. In addition to the claim that Socrates makes the worse argument into the stronger, there is a rumor that Socrates idles the day away talking about things in the sky and below the earth. His reply is that he never discusses such topics (Apology 18a-c). Socrates is distinguishing himself here not just from the sophists and their alleged ability to invert the strength of arguments, but from those we have now come to call the Presocratic philosophers.

The Presocratics were not just those who came before Socrates, for there are some Presocratic philosophers who were his contemporaries. The term is sometimes used to suggest that, while Socrates cared about ethics, the Presocratic philosophers did not. This is misleading, for we have evidence that a number of Presocratics explored ethical issues. The term is best used to refer to the group of thinkers whom Socrates did not influence and whose fundamental uniting characteristic was that they sought to explain the world in terms of its own inherent principles. The 6^th cn. Milesian Thales, for instance, believed that the fundamental principle of all things was water. Anaximander believed the principle was the indefinite (apeiron), and for Anaxamines it was air. Later in Plato’s Apology (26d-e), Socrates rhetorically asks whether Meletus thinks he is prosecuting Anaxagoras, the 5^th cn. thinker who argued that the universe was originally a mixture of elements that have since been set in motion by Nous, or Mind. Socrates suggests that he does not engage in the same sort of cosmological inquiries that were the main focus of many Presocratics.

The other group against which Socrates compares himself is the Sophists, learned men who travelled from city to city offering to teach the youth for a fee. While he claims he thinks it an admirable thing to teach as Gorgias, Prodicus, or Hippias claim they can (Apology 20a), he argues that he himself does not have knowledge of human excellence or virtue (Apology 20b-c). Though Socrates inquires after the nature of virtue, he does not claim to know it, and certainly does not ask to be paid for his conversations.

b. Socratic Themes in Plato’s Apology

i. Socratic Ignorance

Plato’s Socrates moves next to explain the reason he has acquired the reputation he has and why so many citizens dislike him. The oracle at Delphi told Socrates’ friend Chaerephon, “no one is wiser than Socrates” (Apology 21a). Socrates explains that he was not aware of any wisdom he had, and so set out to find someone who had wisdom in order to demonstrate that the oracle was mistaken. He first went to the politicians but found them lacking wisdom. He next visited the poets and found that, though they spoke in beautiful verses, they did so through divine inspiration, not because they had wisdom of any kind. Finally, Socrates found that the craftsmen had knowledge of their own craft, but that they subsequently believed themselves to know much more than they actually did. Socrates concluded that he was better off than his fellow citizens because, while they thought they knew something and did not, he was aware of his own ignorance. The god who speaks through the oracle, he says, is truly wise, whereas human wisdom is worth little or nothing (Apology 23a).

This awareness of one’s own absence of knowledge is what is known as Socratic ignorance, and it is arguably the thing for which Socrates is most famous. Socratic ignorance is sometimes called simple ignorance, to be distinguished from the double ignorance of the citizens with whom Socrates spoke. Simple ignorance is being aware of one’s own ignorance, whereas double ignorance is not being aware of one’s ignorance while thinking that one knows. In showing many influential figures in Athens that they did not know what they thought they did, Socrates came to be despised in many circles.

It is worth nothing that Socrates does not claim here that he knows nothing. He claims that he is aware of his ignorance and that whatever it is that he does know is worthless. Socrates has a number of strong convictions about what makes for an ethical life, though he cannot articulate precisely why these convictions are true. He believes for instance that it is never just to harm anyone, whether friend or enemy, but he does not, at least in Book I of the Republic, offer a systematic account of the nature of justice that could demonstrate why this is true. Because of his insistence on repeated inquiry, Socrates has refined his convictions such that he can both hold particular views about justice while maintaining that he does not know the complete nature of justice.

We can see this contrast quite clearly in Socrates’ cross-examination of his accuser Meletus. Because he is charged with corrupting the youth, Socrates inquires after who it is that helps the youth (Apology, 24d-25a). In the same way that we take a horse to a horse trainer to improve it, Socrates wants to know the person to whom we take a young person to educate him and improve him. Meletus’ silence condemns him: he has never bothered to reflect on such matters, and therefore is unaware of his ignorance about matters that are the foundation of his own accusation (Apology 25b-c). Whether or not Socrates—or Plato for that matter—actually thinks it is possible to achieve expertise in virtue is a subject on which scholars disagree.

ii. Priority of the Care of the Soul

Throughout his defense speech (Apology 20a-b, 24c-25c, 31b, 32d, 36c, 39d) Socrates repeatedly stresses that a human being must care for his soul more than anything else (see also Crito 46c-47d, Euthyphro 13b-c, Gorgias 520a4ff). Socrates found that his fellow citizens cared more for wealth, reputation, and their bodies while neglecting their souls (Apology 29d-30b). He believed that his mission from the god was to examine his fellow citizens and persuade them that the most important good for a human being was the health of the soul. Wealth, he insisted, does not bring about human excellence or virtue, but virtue makes wealth and everything else good for human beings (Apology 30b).

Socrates believes that his mission of caring for souls extends to the entirety of the city of Athens. He argues that the god gave him to the city as a gift and that his mission is to help improve the city. He thus attempts to show that he is not guilty of impiety precisely because everything he does is in response to the oracle and at the service of the god. Socrates characterizes himself as a gadfly and the city as a sluggish horse in need of stirring up (Apology 30e). Without philosophical inquiry, the democracy becomes stagnant and complacent, in danger of harming itself and others. Just as the gadfly is an irritant to the horse but rouses it to action, so Socrates supposes that his purpose is to agitate those around him so that they begin to examine themselves. One might compare this claim with Socrates’ assertion in the Gorgias that, while his contemporaries aim at gratification, he practices the true political craft because he aims at what is best (521d-e). Such comments, in addition to the historical evidence that we have, are Socrates’ strongest defense that he is not only not a burden to the democracy but a great asset to it.

iii. The Unexamined Life

After the jury has convicted Socrates and sentenced him to death, he makes one of the most famous proclamations in the history of philosophy. He tells the jury that he could never keep silent, because “the unexamined life is not worth living for human beings” (Apology 38a). We find here Socrates’ insistence that we are all called to reflect upon what we believe, account for what we know and do not know, and generally speaking to seek out, live in accordance with, and defend those views that make for a well lived and meaningful life.

Some scholars call attention to Socrates’ emphasis on human nature here, and argue that the call to live examined lives follows from our nature as human beings. We are naturally directed by pleasure and pain. We are drawn to power, wealth and reputation, the sorts of values to which Athenians were drawn as well. Socrates’ call to live examined lives is not necessarily an insistence to reject all such motivations and inclinations but rather an injunction to appraise their true worth for the human soul. The purpose of the examined life is to reflect upon our everyday motivations and values and to subsequently inquire into what real worth, if any, they have. If they have no value or indeed are even harmful, it is upon us to pursue those things that are truly valuable.

One can see in reading the Apology that Socrates examines the lives of his jurors during his own trial. By asserting the primacy of the examined life after he has been convicted and sentenced to death, Socrates, the prosecuted, becomes the prosecutor, surreptitiously accusing those who convicted him of not living a life that respects their own humanity. He tells them that by killing him they will not escape examining their lives. To escape giving an account of one’s life is neither possible nor good, Socrates claims, but it is best to prepare oneself to be as good as possible (Apology 39d-e).

We find here a conception of a well-lived life that differs from one that would likely be supported by many contemporary philosophers. Today, most philosophers would argue that we must live ethical lives (though what this means is of course a matter of debate) but that it is not necessary for everyone to engage in the sort of discussions Socrates had every day, nor must one do so in order to be considered a good person. A good person, we might say, lives a good life insofar as he does what is just, but he does not necessarily need to be consistently engaged in debates about the nature of justice or the purpose of the state. No doubt Socrates would disagree, not just because the law might be unjust or the state might do too much or too little, but because, insofar as we are human beings, self-examination is always beneficial to us.

c. Other Socratic Positions and Arguments

In addition to the themes one finds in the Apology, the following are a number of other positions in the Platonic corpus that are typically considered Socratic.

i. Unity of Virtue; All Virtue is Knowledge

In the Protagoras (329b-333b) Socrates argues for the view that all of the virtues—justice, wisdom, courage, piety, and so forth—are one. He provides a number of arguments for this thesis. For example, while it is typical to think that one can be wise without being temperate, Socrates rejects this possibility on the grounds that wisdom and temperance both have the same opposite: folly. Were they truly distinct, they would each have their own opposites. As it stands, the identity of their opposites indicates that one cannot possess wisdom without temperance and vice versa.

This thesis is sometimes paired with another Socratic, view, that is, that virtue is a form of knowledge (Meno 87e-89a; cf. Euthydemus 278d-282a). Things like beauty, strength, and health benefit human beings, but can also harm them if they are not accompanied by knowledge or wisdom. If virtue is to be beneficial it must be knowledge, since all the qualities of the soul are in themselves neither beneficial not harmful, but are only beneficial when accompanied by wisdom and harmful when accompanied by folly.

ii. No One Errs Knowingly/No One Errs Willingly

Socrates famously declares that no one errs or makes mistakes knowingly (Protagoras 352c, 358b-b). Here we find an example of Socrates’ intellectualism. When a person does what is wrong, their failure to do what is right is an intellectual error, or due to their own ignorance about what is right. If the person knew what was right, he would have done it. Hence, it is not possible for someone simultaneously to know what is right and to do what is wrong. If someone does what is wrong, they do so because they do not know what is right, and if they claim they have known what was right at the time when they committed the wrong, they are mistaken, for had they truly known what was right, they would have done it.

Socrates therefore denies the possibility of akrasia, or weakness of the will. No one errs willingly (Protagoras 345c4-e6). While it might seem that Socrates is equivocating between knowingly and willingly, a look at Gorgias 466a-468e helps clarify his thesis. Tyrants and orators, Socrates tells Polus, have the least power of any member of the city because they do not do what they want. What they do is not good or beneficial even though human beings only want what is good or beneficial. The tyrant’s will, corrupted by ignorance, is in such a state that what follows from it will necessarily harm him. Conversely, the will that is purified by knowledge is in such a state that what follows from it will necessarily be beneficial.

iii. All Desire is for the Good

One of the premises of the argument just mentioned is that human beings only desire the good. When a person does something for the sake of something else, it is always the thing for the sake of which he is acting that he wants. All bad things or intermediate things are done not for themselves but for the sake of something else that is good. When a tyrant puts someone to death, for instance, he does this because he thinks it is beneficial in some way. Hence his action is directed towards the good because this is what he truly wants (Gorgias 467c-468b).

A similar version of this argument is in the Meno, 77b-78b. Those that desire bad things do not know that they are truly bad; otherwise, they would not desire them. They do not naturally desire what is bad but rather desire those things that they believe to be good but that are in fact bad. They desire good things even though they lack knowledge of what is actually good.

iv. It is Better to Suffer an Injustice Than to Commit One

Socrates infuriates Polus with the argument that it is better to suffer an injustice than commit one (Gorgias 475a-d). Polus agrees that it is more shameful to commit an injustice, but maintains it is not worse. The worst thing, in his view, is to suffer injustice. Socrates argues that, if something is more shameful, it surpasses in either badness or pain or both. Since committing an injustice is not more painful than suffering one, committing an injustice cannot surpass in pain or both pain and badness. Committing an injustice surpasses suffering an injustice in badness; differently stated, committing an injustice is worse than suffering one. Therefore, given the choice between the two, we should choose to suffer rather than commit an injustice.

This argument must be understood in terms of the Socratic emphasis on the care of the soul. Committing an injustice corrupts one’s soul, and therefore committing injustice is the worst thing a person can do to himself (cf. Crito 47d-48a, Republic I 353d-354a). If one commits injustice, Socrates goes so far as to claim that it is better to seek punishment than avoid it on the grounds that the punishment will purge or purify the soul of its corruption (Gorgias 476d-478e).

v. Eudaimonism

The Greek word for happiness is eudaimonia, which signifies not merely feeling a certain way but being a certain way. A different way of translating eudaimonia is well-being. Many scholars believe that Socrates holds two related but not equivalent principles regarding eudaimonia: first, that it is rationally required that a person make his own happiness the foundational consideration for his actions, and second, that each person does in fact pursue happiness as the foundational consideration for his actions. In relation to Socrates’ emphasis on virtue, it is not entirely clear what that means. Virtue could be identical to happiness—in which case there is no difference between the two and if I am virtuous I am by definition happy—virtue could be a part of happiness—in which case if I am virtuous I will be happy although I could be made happier by the addition of other goods—or virtue could be instrumental for happiness—in which case if I am virtuous I might be happy (and I couldn’t be happy without virtue), but there is no guarantee that I will be happy.

There are a number of passages in the Apology that seem to indicate that the greatest good for a human being is having philosophical conversation (36b-d, 37e-38a, 40e-41c). Meno 87c-89a suggests that knowledge of the good guides the soul toward happiness (cf. Euthydemus 278e-282a). And at Gorgias 507a-c Socrates suggests that the virtuous person, acting in accordance with wisdom, attains happiness (cf. Gorgias 478c-e: the happiest person has no badness in his soul).

vi. Ruling is An Expertise

Socrates is committed to the theme that ruling is a kind of craft or art (technē). As such, it requires knowledge. Just as a doctor brings about a desired result for his patient—health, for instance—so the ruler should bring about some desired result in his subject (Republic 341c-d, 342c). Medicine, insofar as it has the best interest of its patient in mind, never seeks to benefit the practitioner. Similarly, the ruler’s job is to act not for his own benefit but for the benefit of the citizens of the political community. This is not to say that there might not be some contingent benefit that accrues to the practitioner; the doctor, for instance, might earn a fine salary. But this benefit is not intrinsic to the expertise of medicine as such. One could easily conceive of a doctor that makes very little money. One cannot, however, conceive of a doctor that does not act on behalf of his patient. Analogously, ruling is always for the sake of the ruled citizen, and justice, contra the famous claim from Thrasymachus, is not whatever is in the interest of the ruling power (Republic 338c-339a).

d. Socrates the Ironist

The suspicion that Socrates is an ironist can mean a number of things: on the one hand, it can indicate that Socrates is saying something with the intent to convey the opposite meaning. Some readers for instance, including a number in the ancient world, understood Socrates’ avowal of ignorance in precisely this way. Many have interpreted Socrates’ praise of Euthyphro, in which he claims that he can learn from him and will become his pupil, as an example of this sort of irony (Euthyphro 5a-b). On the other hand, the Greek word eirōneia was understood to carry with it a sense of subterfuge, rendering the sense of the word something like masking with the intent to deceive.

Additionally, there are a number of related questions about Socrates’ irony. Is the interlocutor supposed to be aware of the irony, or is he ignorant of it? Is it the job of the reader to discern the irony? Is the purpose of irony rhetorical, intended to maintain Socrates’ position as the director of the conversation, or pedagogical, meant to encourage the interlocutor to learn something? Could it be both?

Scholars disagree on the sense in which we ought to call Socrates ironic. When Socrates asks Callicles to tell him what he means by the stronger and to go easy on him so that he might learn better, Callicles claims he is being ironic (Gorgias 489e). Thrasymachus accuses Socrates of being ironic insofar as he pretends he does not have an account of justice, when he is actually hiding what he truly thinks (Republic 337a). And though the Symposium is generally not thought to be a “Socratic” dialogue, we there find Alcibiades accusing Socrates of being ironic insofar as he acts like he is interested in him but then deny his advances (Symposium 216e, 218d). It is not clear which kind of irony is at work with these examples.

Aristotle defines irony as an attempt at self-deprecation (Nicomachean Ethics 4.7, 1127b23-26). He argues that self-deprecation is the opposite of boastfulness, and people that engage in this sort of irony do so to avoid pompousness and make their characters more attractive. Above all, such people disclaim things that bring reputation. On this reading, Socrates was prone to understatement.

There are some thinkers for whom Socratic irony is not just restricted to what Socrates says. The 19^th century Danish philosopher Søren Kierkegaard held the view that Socrates himself, his character, is ironic. The 20^th century philosopher Leo Strauss defined irony as the noble dissimulation of one’s worth. On this reading, Socrates’ irony consisted in his refusal to display his superiority in front of his inferiors so that his message would be understood only by the privileged few. As such, Socratic irony is intended to conceal Socrates’ true message.

3. Method: How Did Socrates Do Philosophy?

As famous as the Socratic themes are, the Socratic method is equally famous. Socrates conducted his philosophical activity by means of question an answer, and we typically associate with him a method called the elenchus. At the same time, Plato’s Socrates calls himself a midwife—who has no ideas of his own but helps give birth to the ideas of others—and proceeds dialectically—defined either as asking questions, embracing the practice of collection and division, or proceeding from hypotheses to first principles.

a. The Elenchus: Socrates the Refuter

A typical Socratic elenchus is a cross-examination of a particular position, proposition, or definition, in which Socrates tests what his interlocutor says and refutes it. There is, however, great debate amongst scholars regarding not only what is being refuted but also whether or not the elenchus can prove anything. There are questions, in other words, about the topic of the elenchus and its purpose or goal.

i. Topic

Socrates typically begins his elenchus with the question, “what is it”? What is piety, he asks Euthyphro. Euthyphro appears to give five separate definitions of piety: piety is proceeding against whomever does injustice (5d-6e), piety is what is loved by the gods (6e-7a), piety is what is loved by all the gods (9e), the godly and the pious is the part of the just that is concerned with the care of the gods (12e), and piety is the knowledge of sacrificing and praying (13d-14a). For some commentators, what Socrates is searching for here is a definition. Other commentators argue that Socrates is searching for more than just the definition of piety but seeks a comprehensive account of the nature of piety. Whatever the case, Socrates refutes the answer given to him in response to the ‘what is it’ question.

Another reading of the Socratic elenchus is that Socrates is not just concerned with the reply of the interlocutor but is concerned with the interlocutor himself. According to this view, Socrates is as much concerned with the truth or falsity of propositions as he is with the refinement of the interlocutor’s way of life. Socrates is concerned with both epistemological and moral advances for the interlocutor and himself. It is not propositions or replies alone that are refuted, for Socrates does not conceive of them dwelling in isolation from those that hold them. Thus conceived, the elenchus refutes the person holding a particular view, not just the view. For instance, Socrates shames Thrasymachus when he shows him that he cannot maintain his view that justice is ignorance and injustice is wisdom (Republic I 350d). The elenchus demonstrates that Thrasymachus cannot consistently maintain all his claims about the nature of justice. This view is consistent with a view we find in Plato’s late dialogue called the Sophist, in which the Visitor from Elea, not Socrates, claims that the soul will not get any advantage from learning that it is offered to it until someone shames it by refuting it (230b-d).

ii. Purpose

In terms of goal, there are two common interpretations of the elenchus. Both have been developed by scholars in response to what Gregory Vlastos called the problem of the Socratic elenchus. The problem is how Socrates can claim that position W is false, when the only thing he has established is its inconsistency with other premises whose truth he has not tried to establish in the elenchus.

The first response is what is called the constructivist position. A constructivist argues that the elenchus establishes the truth or falsity of individual answers. The elenchus on this interpretation can and does have positive results. Vlastos himself argued that Socrates not only established the inconsistency of the interlocutor’s beliefs by showing their inconsistency, but that Socrates’ own moral beliefs were always consistent, able to withstand the test of the elenchus. Socrates could therefore pick out a faulty premise in his elenctic exchange with an interlocutor, and sought to replace the interlocutor’s false beliefs with his own.

The second response is called the non-constructivist position. This position claims that Socrates does not think the elenchus can establish the truth or falsity of individual answers. The non-constructivist argues that all the elenchus can show is the inconsistency of W with the premises X, Y, and Z. It cannot establish that ~W is the case, or, for that matter, replace any of the premises with another, for this would require a separate argument. The elenchus establishes the falsity of the conjunction of W, X, Y, and Z, but not the truth or falsity of any of those premises individually. The purpose of the elenchus on this interpretation is to show the interlocutor that he is confused, and, according to some scholars, to use that confusion as a stepping stone on the way to establishing a more consistent, well-formed set of beliefs.

b. Maieutic: Socrates the Midwife

In Plato’s Theaetetus Socrates identifies himself as a midwife (150b-151b). While the dialogue is not generally considered Socratic, it is elenctic insofar as it tests and refutes Theaetetus’ definitions of knowledge. It also ends without a conclusive answer to its question, a characteristic it shares with a number of Socratic dialogues.

Socrates tells Theaetetus that his mother Phaenarete was a midwife (149a) and that he himself is an intellectual midwife. Whereas the craft of midwifery (150b-151d) brings on labor pains or relieves them in order to help a woman deliver a child, Socrates does not watch over the body but over the soul, and helps his interlocutor give birth to an idea. He then applies the elenchus to test whether or not the intellectual offspring is a phantom or a fertile truth. Socrates stresses that both he and actual midwives are barren, and cannot give birth to their own offspring. In spite of his own emptiness of ideas, Socrates claims to be skilled at bringing forth the ideas of others and examining them.

c. Dialectic: Socrates the Constructer

The method of dialectic is thought to be more Platonic than Socratic, though one can understand why many have associated it with Socrates himself. For one thing, the Greek dialegesthai ordinarily means simply “to converse” or “to discuss.” Hence when Socrates is distinguishing this sort of discussion from rhetorical exposition in the Gorgias, the contrast seems to indicate his preference for short questions and answers as opposed to longer speeches (447b-c, 448d-449c).

There are two other definitions of dialectic in the Platonic corpus. First, in the Republic, Socrates distinguishes between dianoetic thinking, which makes use of the senses and assumes hypotheses, and dialectical thinking, which does not use the senses and goes beyond hypotheses to first principles (Republic VII 510c-511c, 531d-535a). Second, in the Phaedrus, Sophist, Statesman, and Philebus, dialectic is defined as a method of collection and division. One collects things that are scattered into one kind and also divides each kind according to its species (Phaedrus 265d-266c).

Some scholars view the elenchus and dialectic as fundamentally different methods with different goals, while others view them as consistent and reconcilable. Some even view them as two parts of one argument procedure, in which the elenchus refutes and dialectic constructs.

4. Legacy: How Have Other Philosophers Understood Socrates?

Nearly every school of philosophy in antiquity had something positive to say about Socrates, and most of them drew their inspiration from him. Socrates also appears in the works of many famous modern philosophers. Immanuel Kant, the 18^th century German philosopher best known for the categorical imperative, hailed Socrates, amongst other ancient philosophers, as someone who didn’t just speculate but who lived philosophically. One of the more famous quotes about Socrates is from John Stuart Mill, the 19^th century utilitarian philosopher who claimed that it is better to be a human being dissatisfied than a pig satisfied; better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied. The following is but a brief survey of Socrates as he is treated in philosophical thinking that emerges after the death of Aristotle in 322 B.C.E.

a. Hellenistic Philosophy

i. The Cynics

The Cynics greatly admired Socrates, and traced their philosophical lineage back to him. One of the first representatives of the Socratic legacy was the Cynic Diogenes of Sinope. No genuine writings of Diogenes have survived and most of our evidence about him is anecdotal. Nevertheless, scholars attribute a number of doctrines to him. He sought to undermine convention as a foundation for ethical values and replace it with nature. He understood the essence of human being to be rational, and defined happiness as freedom and self-mastery, an objective readily accessible to those who trained the body and mind.

ii. The Stoics

There is a biographical story according to which Zeno, the founder of the Stoic school and not the Zeno of Zeno’s Paradoxes, became interested in philosophy by reading and inquiring about Socrates. The Stoics took themselves to be authentically Socratic, especially in defending the unqualified restriction of ethical goodness to ethical excellence, the conception of ethical excellence as a kind of knowledge, a life not requiring any bodily or external advantage nor ruined by any bodily disadvantage, and the necessity and sufficiency of ethical excellence for complete happiness.

Zeno is known for his characterization of the human good as a smooth flow of life. Stoics were therefore attracted to the Socratic elenchus because it could expose inconsistencies—both social and psychological—that disrupted one’s life. In the absence of justification for a specific action or belief, one would not be in harmony with oneself, and therefore would not live well. On the other hand, if one held a position that survived cross-examination, such a position would be consistent and coherent. The Socratic elenchus was thus not just an important social and psychological test, but also an epistemological one. The Stoics held that knowledge was a coherent set of psychological attitudes, and therefore a person holding attitudes that could withstand the elenchus could be said to have knowledge. Those with inconsistent or incoherent psychological commitments were thought to be ignorant.

Socrates also figures in Roman Stoicism, particularly in the works of Seneca and Epictetus. Both men admired Socrates’ strength of character. Seneca praises Socrates for his ability to remain consistent unto himself in the face of the threat posed by the Thirty Tyrants, and also highlights the Socratic focus on caring for oneself instead of fleeing oneself and seeking fulfillment by external means. Epictetus, when offering advice about holding to one’s own moral laws as inviolable maxims, claims, “though you are not yet a Socrates, you ought, however, to live as one desirous of becoming a Socrates” (Enchiridion 50).

One aspect of Socrates to which Epictetus was particularly attracted was the elenchus. Though his understanding of the process is in some ways different from Socrates’, throughout his Discourses Epictetus repeatedly stresses the importance of recognition of one’s ignorance (2.17.1) and awareness of one’s own impotence regarding essentials (2.11.1). He characterizes Socrates as divinely appointed to hold the elenctic position (3.21.19) and associates this role with Socrates’ protreptic expertise (2.26.4-7). Epictetus encouraged his followers to practice the elenchus on themselves, and claims that Socrates did precisely this on account of his concern with self-examination (2.1.32-3).

iii. The Skeptics

Broadly speaking, skepticism is the view that we ought to be either suspicious of claims to epistemological truth or at least withhold judgment from affirming absolute claims to knowledge. Amongst Pyrrhonian skeptics, Socrates appears at times like a dogmatist and at other times like a skeptic or inquirer. On the one hand, Sextus Empiricus lists Socrates as a thinker who accepts the existence of god (Against the Physicists, I.9.64) and then recounts the cosmological argument that Xenophon attributes to Socrates (Against the Physicists, I.9.92-4). On the other hand, in arguing that human being is impossible to conceive, Sextus Empiricus cites Socrates as unsure whether or not he is a human being or something else (Outlines of Pyrrhonism 2.22). Socrates is also said to have remained in doubt about this question (Against the Professors 7.264).

Academic skeptics grounded their position that nothing can be known in Socrates’ admission of ignorance in the Apology (Cicero, On the Orator 3.67, Academics 1.44). Arcesilaus, the first head of the Academy to take it toward a skeptical turn, picked up from Socrates the procedure of arguing, first asking others to give their positions and then refuting them (Cicero, On Ends 2.2, On the Orator 3.67, On the Nature of the Gods 1.11). While the Academy would eventually move away from skepticism, Cicero, speaking on behalf of the Academy of Philo, makes the claim that Socrates should be understood as endorsing the claim that nothing, other than one’s own ignorance, could be known (Academics 2.74).

iv. The Epicurean

The Epicureans were one of the few schools that criticized Socrates, though many scholars think that this was in part because of their animus toward their Stoic counterparts, who admired him. In general, Socrates is depicted in Epicurean writings as a sophist, rhetorician, and skeptic who ignored natural science for the sake of ethical inquiries that concluded without answers. Colotes criticizes Socrates’ statement in the Phaedrus (230a) that he does not know himself (Plutarch, Against Colotes 21 1119b), and Philodemus attacks Socrates’ argument in the Protagoras (319d) that virtue cannot be taught (Rhetoric I 261, 8ff).

The Epicureans wrote a number of books against several of Plato’s Socratic dialogues, including the Lysis, Euthydemus, and Gorgias. In the Gorgias we find Socrates suspicious of the view that pleasure is intrinsically worthy and his insistence that pleasure is not the equivalent of the good (Gorgias 495b-499b). In defining pleasure as freedom from disturbance (ataraxia) and defining this sort of pleasure as the sole good for human beings, the Epicureans shared little with the unbridled hedonism Socrates criticizes Callicles for embracing. Indeed, in the Letter to Menoeceus, Epicurus explicitly argues against pursuing this sort of pleasure (131-132). Nonetheless, the Epicureans did equate pleasure with the good, and the view that pleasure is not the equivalent of the good could not have endeared Socrates to their sentiment.

Another reason for the Epicurean refusal to praise Socrates or make him a cornerstone of their tradition was his perceived irony. According to Cicero, Epicurus was opposed to Socrates’ representing himself as ignorant while simultaneously praising others like Protagoras, Hippias, Prodicus, and Gorgias (Rhetoric, Vol. II, Brutus 292). This irony for the Epicureans was pedagogically pointless: if Socrates had something to say, he should have said it instead of hiding it.

v. The Peripatetics

Aristotle’s followers, the Peripatetics, either said little about Socrates or were pointedly vicious in their attacks. Amongst other things, the Peripatetics accused Socrates of being a bigamist, a charge that appears to have gained so much traction that the Stoic Panaetius wrote a refutation of it (Plutarch, Aristides 335c-d). The general peripatetic criticism of Socrates, similar in one way to the Epicureans, was that he concentrated solely on ethics, and that this was an unacceptable ideal for the philosophical life.

b. Modern Philosophy

i. Hegel

In Socrates, Hegel found what he called the great historic turning point (Philosophy of History, 448). With Socrates, Hegel claims, two opposed rights came into collision: the individual consciousness and the universal law of the state. Prior to Socrates, morality for the ancients was present but it was not present Socratically. That is, the good was present as a universal, without its having had the form of the conviction of the individual in his consciousness (407). Morality was present as an immediate absolute, directing the lives of citizens without their having reflected upon it and deliberated about it for themselves. The law of the state, Hegel claims, had authority as the law of the gods, and thus had a universal validity that was recognized by all (408).

In Hegel’s view the coming of Socrates signals a shift in the relationship between the individual and morality. The immediate now had to justify itself to the individual consciousness. Hegel thus not only ascribes to Socrates the habit of asking questions about what one should do but also about the actions that the state has prescribed. With Socrates, consciousness is turned back within itself and demands that the law should establish itself before consciousness, internal to it, not merely outside it (408-410). Hegel attributes to Socrates a reflective questioning that is skeptical, which moves the individual away from unreflective obedience and into reflective inquiry about the ethical standards of one’s community.

Generally, Hegel finds in Socrates a skepticism that renders ordinary or immediate knowledge confused and insecure, in need of reflective certainty which only consciousness can bring (370). Though he attributes to the sophists the same general skeptical comportment, in Socrates Hegel locates human subjectivity at a higher level. With Socrates and onward we have the world raising itself to the level of conscious thought and becoming object for thought. The question as to what Nature is gives way to the question about what Truth is, and the question about the relationship of self-conscious thought to real essence becomes the predominant philosophical issue (450-1).

ii. Kierkegaard

Kierkegaard’s most well recognized views on Socrates are from his dissertation, The Concept of Irony With Continual Reference to Socrates. There, he argues that Socrates is not the ethical figure that the history of philosophy has thought him to be, but rather an ironist in all that he does. Socrates does not just speak ironically but is ironic. Indeed, while most people have found Aristophanes’ portrayal of Socrates an obvious exaggeration and caricature, Kierkegaard goes so far as to claim that he came very close to the truth in his depiction of Socrates. He rejects Hegel’s picture of Socrates ushering in a new era of philosophical reflection and instead argues that the limits of Socratic irony testified to the need for religious faith. As opposed to the Hegelian view that Socratic irony was an instrument in the service of the development of self-consciousness, Kierkegaard claims that irony was Socrates’ position or comportment, and that he did not have any more than this to give.

Later in his writing career Kierkegaard comes to think that he has neglected Socrates’ significance as an ethical and religious figure. In his final essay entitled My Task, Kierkegaard claims that his mission is a Socratic one; that is, in his task to reinvigorate a Christianity that remained the cultural norm but had, in Kierkegaard’s eyes, nearly ceased altogether to be practiced authentically, Kierkegaard conceives of himself as a kind of Christian Socrates, rousing Christians from their complacency to a conception of Christian faith as the highest, most passionate expression of individual subjectivity. Kierkegaard therefore sees himself as a sort of Christian gadfly. The Socratic call to become aware of one’s own ignorance finds its parallel in the Kierkegaardian call to recognize one’s own failing to truly live as a Christian. The Socratic claim to ignorance—while Socrates is closer to knowledge than his contemporaries—is replaced by the Kierkegaard’s claim that he is not a Christian—though certainly more so than his own contemporaries.

iii. Nietzsche

Nietzsche’s most famous account of Socrates is his scathing portrayal in The Birth of Tragedy, in which Socrates and rational thinking lead to the emergence of an age of decadence in Athens. The delicate balance in Greek culture between the Apollonian—order, calmness, self-control, restraint—and the Dionysian—chaos, revelry, self-forgetfulness, indulgence— initially represented on stage in the tragedies of Aeschylus and Sophocles, gave way to the rationalism of Euripides. Euripides, Nietzsche argues, was only a mask for the newborn demon called Socrates (section 12). Tragedy—and Greek culture more generally—was corrupted by “aesthetic Socratism”, whose supreme law, Nietzsche argues, was that ‘to be beautiful everything must be intelligible’. Whereas the former sort of tragedy absorbed the spectator in the activities and sufferings of its chief characters, the emergence of Socrates heralded the onset of a new kind of tragedy in which this identification is obstructed by the spectators having to figure out the meaning and presuppositions of the characters’ suffering.

Nietzsche continues his attack on Socrates later in his career in Twilight of the Idols. Socrates here represents the lowest class of people (section 3), and his irony consists in his being an exaggeration at the same time as he conceals himself (4). He is the inventor of dialectic (5) which he wields mercilessly because, being an ugly plebeian, he had no other means of expressing himself (6) and therefore employed question and answer to render his opponent powerless (7). Socrates turned dialectic into a new kind of contest (8), and because his instincts had turned against each other and were in anarchy (9), he established the rule of reason as a counter-tyrant in order not to perish (10). Socrates’ decadence here consists in his having to fight his instincts (11). He was thus profoundly anti-life, so much so that he wanted to die (12).

Nonetheless, while Nietzsche accuses Socrates of decadence, he nevertheless recognizes him as a powerful individual, which perhaps accounts for why we at times find in Nietzsche a hesitant admiration of Socrates. He calls Socrates one of the very greatest instinctive forces (The Birth of Tragedy, section 13), labels him as a “free spirit” (Human, All Too Human I, 433) praises him as the first “philosopher of life” in his 17^th lecture on the Preplatonics, and anoints him a ‘virtuoso of life’ in his notebooks from 1875. Additionally, contra Twilight of the Idols, in Thus Spoke Zarathustra, Nietzsche speaks of a death in which one’s virtue still shines, and some commentators have seen in this a celebration of the way in which Socrates died.

iv. Heidegger

Heidegger finds in Socrates a kinship with his own view that the truth of philosophy lies in a certain way of seeing things, and thus is identical with a particular kind of method. He attributes to Socrates the view that the truth of some subject matter shows itself not in some definition that is the object or end of a process of inquiry, but in the very process of inquiry itself. Heidegger characterizes the Socratic method as a kind of productive negation: by refuting that which stands in front of it—in Socrates’ case, an interlocutor’s definition—it discloses the positive in the very process of questioning. Socrates is not interested in articulating propositions about piety but rather concerned with persisting in a questioning relation to it that preserves its irreducible sameness. Behind multiple examples of pious action is Piety, and yet Piety is not something that can be spoken of. It is that which discloses itself through the process of silent interrogation.

It is precisely in his emphasis on silence that Heidegger diverges from Socrates. Where Socrates insisted on the give and take of question and answer, Heideggerian questioning is not necessarily an inquiry into the views of others but rather an openness to the truth that one maintains without the need to speak. To remain in dialogue with a given phenomenon is not the same thing as conversing about it, and true dialogue is always silent.

v. Gadamer

As Heidegger’s student, Gadamer shares his fundamental view that truth and method cannot be divorced in philosophy. At the same time, his hermeneutics leads him to argue for the importance of dialectic as conversation. Gadamer claims that whereas philosophical dialectic presents the whole truth by superceding all its partial propositions, hermeneutics too has the task of revealing a totality of meaning in all its relations. The distinguishing characteristic of Gadamer’s hermeneutical dialectic is that it recognizes radical finitude: we are always already in an open-ended dialogical situation. Conversation with the interlocutor is thus not a distraction that leads us away from seeing the truth but rather is the site of truth. It is for this reason that Gadamer claims Plato communicated his philosophy only in dialogues: it was more than just homage to Socrates, but was a reflection of his view that the word find its confirmation in another and in the agreement of another.

Gadamer also sees in the Socratic method an ethical way of being. That is, he does not just think that Socrates converses about ethics but that repeated Socratic conversation is itself indicative of an ethical comportment. On this account, Socrates knows the good not because he can give some final definition of it but rather because of his readiness to give an account of it. The problem of not living an examined life is not that we might live without knowing what is ethical, but because without asking questions as Socrates does, we will not be ethical.

5. References and Further Reading

Ahbel-Rappe, Sara, and Rachana Kamtekar (eds.), A Companion to Socrates (Oxford: Blackwell, 2006).
Arrowsmith, William, Lattimore, Richmond, and Parker, Douglass (trans.), Four Plays by Aristophanes: The Clouds, The Birds, Lysistrata, The Frogs (New York: Meridian, 1994).
Barnes, Jonathan, Complete Works of Aristotle vols. 1 & 2 (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984).
Benson, Hugh H. (ed.), Essays on the Philosophy of Socrates (New York: Oxford University Press, 1992).
Brickhouse, Thomas C. & Smith, Nicholas D., Plato’s Socrates (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994).
Burkert, Walter, Greek Religion (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1985).
Cooper, John M., Plato: Collected Works (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1997).
Guthrie, W.K.C., Socrates (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1971).
Kahn, Charles H., Plato and the Socratic Dialogue (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996).
Kraut, Richard (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Plato (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992).
Morrison, Donald R., The Cambridge Companion to Socrates (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012).
Rudebusch, George, Socrates (Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2009).
Santas, Gerasimos, Socrates: Philosophy in Plato’s Early Dialogues (London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1979).
Taylor, C.C.W, 1998, Socrates (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998).
Vlastos, Gregory, Socrates, Ironist and Moral Philosopher (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991).
Xenophon: Memorabilia. Oeconomicus. Symposium. Apologia. (Loeb Classical Library, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1923).

Author Information

James M. Ambury
Email: jamesambury@kings.edu
King’s College
U. S. A.

John Locke (1632—1704)

John Locke was among the most famous philosophers and political theorists of the 17^th century. He is often regarded as the founder of a school of thought known as British Empiricism, and he made foundational contributions to modern theories of limited, liberal government. He also was influential in the areas of theology, religious toleration, and educational theory. In his most important work, the Essay Concerning Human Understanding, Locke set out to offer an analysis of the human mind and its acquisition of knowledge. He offered an empiricist theory according to which we acquire ideas through our experience of the world. The mind is then able to examine, compare, and combine these ideas in numerous different ways. Knowledge consists of a special kind of relationship between different ideas. Locke’s emphasis on the philosophical examination of the human mind as a preliminary to the philosophical investigation of the world and its contents represented a new approach to philosophy, one which quickly gained a number of converts, especially in Great Britain. In addition to this broader project, the Essay contains a series of more focused discussions on important, and widely divergent, philosophical themes. In politics, Locke is best known as a proponent of limited government. He uses a theory of natural rights to argue that governments have obligations to their citizens, have only limited powers over their citizens, and can ultimately be overthrown by citizens under certain circumstances. He also provided powerful arguments in favor of religious toleration. This article attempts to give a broad overview of all key areas of Locke’s thought.

Life and Works
The Main Project of the Essay
Special Topics in the Essay
Political Philosophy
Theology
Education
Locke’s Influence
References and Further Reading
1. Locke’s Works
2. Recommended Reading

1. Life and Works

John Locke was born in 1632 in Wrington, a small village in southwestern England. His father, also named John, was a legal clerk and served with the Parliamentary forces in the English Civil War. His family was well-to-do, but not of particularly high social or economic standing. Locke spent his childhood in the West Country and as a teenager was sent to Westminster School in London.

Locke was successful at Westminster and earned a place at Christ Church, Oxford. He was to remain in Oxford from 1652 until 1667. Although he had little appreciation for the traditional scholastic philosophy he learned there, Locke was successful as a student and after completing his undergraduate degree he held a series of administrative and academic posts in the college. Some of Locke’s duties included instruction of undergraduates. One of his earliest substantive works, the Essays on the Law of Nature, was developed in the course of his teaching duties. Much of Locke’s intellectual effort and energy during his time at Oxford, especially during his later years there, was devoted to the study of medicine and natural philosophy (what we would now call science). Locke read widely in these fields, participated in various experiments, and became acquainted with Robert Boyle and many other notable natural philosophers. He also undertook the normal course of education and training to become a physician.

Locke left Oxford for London in 1667 where he became attached to the family of Anthony Ashley Cooper (then Lord Ashley, later the Earl of Shaftesbury). Locke may have played a number of roles in the household, mostly likely serving as tutor to Ashley’s son. In London, Locke continued to pursue his interests in medicine and natural philosophy. He formed a close working relationship with Thomas Sydenham, who later became one the most famous physicians of the age. He made a number of contacts within the newly formed Royal Society and became a member in 1668. He also acted as the personal physician to Lord Ashley. Indeed, on one occasion Locke participated in a very delicate surgical operation which Ashley credited with saving his life. Ashley was one of the most prominent English politicians at the time. Through his patronage Locke was able to hold a series of governmental posts. Most of his work related to policies in England’s American and Caribbean colonies. Most importantly, this was the period in Locke’s life when he began the project which would culminate in his most famous work, the Essay Concerning Human Understanding. The two earliest drafts of that work date from 1671. He was to continue work on this project intermittentlyfor nearly twenty years.

Locke travelled in France for several years starting in 1675. When he returned to England it was only to be for a few years. The political scene had changed greatly while Locke was away. Shaftesbury (as Ashley was now known) was out of favor and Locke’s association with him had become a liability. It was around this time that Locke composed his most famous political work, the Two Treatises Concerning Government. Although the Two Treatises would not be published until 1689 they show that he had already solidified his views on the nature and proper form of government. Following Shaftesbury’s death Locke fled to the Netherlands to escape political persecution. While there Locke travelled a great deal (sometimes for his own safety) and worked on two projects. First, he continued work on the Essay. Second, he wrote a work entitled Epistola de Tolerantia, which was published anonymously in 1689. Locke’s experiences in England, France, and the Netherlands convinced him that governments should be much more tolerant of religious diversity than was common at the time.

Following the Glorious Revolution of 1688-1689 Locke was able to return to England. He published both the Essay and the Two Treatises (the second anonymously) shortly after his return. He initially stayed in London but soon moved to the home of Francis and Damaris Masham in the small village of Oates, Essex. Damaris Masham, who was the daughter of a notable philosopher named Ralph Cudworth, had become acquainted with Locke several years before. The two formed a very close friendship which lasted until Locke’s death. During this period Locke kept busy working on politics, toleration, philosophy, economics, and educational theory.

Locke engaged in a number of controversies during his life, including a notable one with Jonas Proast over toleration. But Locke’s most famous and philosophically important controversy was with Edward Stillingfleet, the Bishop of Worcester. Stillingfleet, in addition to being a powerful political and theological figure, was an astute and forceful critic. The two men debated a number of the positions in the Essay in a series of published letters.

In his later years Locke devoted much of his attention to theology. His major work in this field was The Reasonableness of Christianity, published (again anonymously) in 1695. This work was controversial because Locke argued that many beliefs traditionally believed to be mandatory for Christians were unnecessary. Locke argued for a highly ecumenical form of Christianity. Closer to the time of his death Locke wrote a work on the Pauline Epistles. The work was unfinished, but published posthumously. A short work on miracles also dates from this time and was published posthumously.

Locke suffered from health problems for most of his adult life. In particular, he had respiratory ailments which were exacerbated by his visits to London where the air quality was very poor. His health took a turn for the worse in 1704 and he became increasingly debilitated. He died on 28 October 1704 while Damaris Masham was reading him the Psalms. He was buried at High Laver, near Oates. He wrote his own epitaph which was both humble and forthright.

2. The Main Project of the Essay

According to Locke’s own account the motivation for writing the Essay came to him while debating an unrelated topic with friends. He reports that they were able to make little headway on this topic and that they very quickly met with a number of confusions and difficulties. Locke realized that to make progress on this topic it was first necessary to examine something more fundamental: the human understanding. It was “necessary to examine our own Abilities, and see, what Objects our Understandings were, or were not fitted to deal with.” (Epistle, 7).

Locke’s insight was that before we can analyze the world and our access to it we have to know something about ourselves. We need to know how we acquire knowledge. We also need to know which areas of inquiry we are well suited to and which are epistemically closed to us, that is, which areas are such that we could not know them even in principle. We further need to know what knowledge consists in. In keeping with these questions, at the very outset of the Essay Locke writes that it is his “Purpose enquire into the Original, Certainty, and Extent of humane Knowledge; together, with the Grounds and Degrees of Belief, Opinion, and Assent.” (1.1.2, 42). Locke thinks that it is only once we understand our cognitive capabilities that we can suitably direct our researches into the world. This may have been what Locke had in mind when he claimed that part of his ambition in the Essay was to be an “Under-Laborer” who cleared the ground and laid the foundations for the work of famous scientists like Robert Boyle and Isaac Newton.

The Essay is divided into four books with each book contributing to Locke’s overall goal of examining the human mind with respect to its contents and operations. In Book I Locke rules out one possible origin of our knowledge. He argues that our knowledge cannot have been innate. This sets up Book II in which Locke argues that all of our ideas come from experience. In this book he seeks to give an account of how even ideas like God, infinity, and space could have been acquired through our perceptual access to the world and our mental operations. Book III is something of a digression as Locke turns his attention to language and the role it plays in our theorizing. Locke’s main goal here is cautionary, he thinks language is often an obstacle to understanding and he offers some recommendations to avoid confusion. Finally, Book IV discusses knowledge, belief, and opinion. Locke argues that knowledge consists of special kinds of relations between ideas and that we should regulate our beliefs accordingly.

a. Ideas

The first chapter of the Essay contains an apology for the frequent use of the word “idea” in the book. According to Locke, ideas are the fundamental units of mental content and so play an integral role in his explanation of the human mind and his account of our knowledge. Locke was not the first philosopher to give ideas a central role; Descartes, for example, had relied heavily on them in explaining the human mind. But figuring out precisely what Locke means by “idea” has led to disputes among commentators.

One place to begin is with Locke’s own definition. He claims that by “idea” he means “whatsoever is the Object of the Understanding when a Man thinks…whatever is meant by Phantasm, Notion, Species, or whatever it is, which the Mind can be employ’d about in thinking.” (1.1.8, 47). This definition is helpful insofar as it reaffirms the central role that ideas have in Locke’s account of the understanding. Ideas are the sole entities upon which our minds work. Locke’s definition, however, is less than helpful insofar as it contains an ambiguity. On one reading, ideas are mental objects. The thought is that when an agent perceives an external world object like an apple there is some thing in her mind which represents that apple. So when an agent considers an apple what she is really doing is thinking about the idea of that apple. On a different reading, ideas are mental actions. The thought here is that when an agent perceives an apple she is really perceiving the apple in a direct, unmediated way. The idea is the mental act of making perceptual contact with the external world object. In recent years, most commentators have adopted the first of these two readings. But this debate will be important in the discussion of knowledge below.

b. The Critique of Nativism

The first of the Essay’s four books is devoted to a critique of nativism, the doctrine that some ideas are innate in the human mind, rather than received in experience. It is unclear precisely who Locke’s targets in this book are, though Locke does cite Herbert of Cherbury and other likely candidates include René Descartes, the Cambridge Platonists, and a number of lesser known Anglican theologians. Finding specific targets, however, might not be that important given that much of what Locke seeks to do in Book I is motivate and make plausible the alternative account of idea acquisition that he offers in Book II.

The nativist view which Locke attacks in Book I holds that human beings have mental content which is innate in the mind. This means that there are certain ideas (units of mental content) which were neither acquired via experience nor constructed by the mind out of ideas received in experience. The most popular version of this position holds that there are certain ideas which God planted in all minds at the moment of their creation.

Locke attacks both the view that we have any innate principles (for example, the whole is greater than the part, do unto others as you would have done unto you, etc.) as well as the view that there are any innate singular ideas (for example, God, identity, substance, and so forth). The main thrust of Locke’s argument lies in pointing out that none of the mental content alleged to be innate is universally shared by all humans. He notes that children and the mentally disabled, for example, do not have in their minds an allegedly innate complex thought like “equals taken from equals leave equals”. He also uses evidence from travel literature to point out that many non-Europeans deny what were taken to be innate moral maxims and that some groups even lack the idea of a God. Locke takes the fact that not all humans have these ideas as evidence that they were not implanted by God in humans minds, and that they are therefore acquired rather than innate.

There is one misunderstanding which it is important to avoid when considering Locke’s anti-nativism. The misunderstanding is, in part, suggested by Locke’s claim that the mind is like a tabula rasa (a blank slate) prior to sense experience. This makes it sound as though the mind is nothing prior to the advent of ideas. In fact, Locke’s position is much more nuanced. He makes it clear that the mind has any number of inherent capacities, predispositions, and inclinations prior to receiving any ideas from sensation. His anti-nativist point is just that none of these is triggered or exercised until the mind receives ideas from sensation.

c. Idea Acquisition

In Book II Locke offers his alternative theory of how the human mind comes to be furnished with the ideas it has. Every day we think of complex things like orange juice, castles, justice, numbers, and motion. Locke’s claim is that the ultimate origin of all of these ideas lies in experience: “Experience: In that, all our Knowledge is founded; and from that it ultimately derives itself. Our Observation employ’d either about external, sensible Objects; or about the internal Operations of our Minds, perceived and reflected on by ourselves, is that, which supplies our Understandings with all the material of thinking. These two are the Fountains of Knowledge, from whence all the Ideas we have, or can naturally have, do spring.” (2.1.2, 104).

In the above passage Locke allows for two distinct types of experience. Outer experience, or sensation, provides us with ideas from the traditional five senses. Sight gives us ideas of colors, hearing gives us ideas of sounds, and so on. Thus, my idea of a particular shade of green is a product of seeing a fern. And my idea of a particular tone is the product of my being in the vicinity of a piano while it was being played. Inner experience, or reflection, is slightly more complicated. Locke thinks that the human mind is incredibly active; it is constantly performing what he calls operations. For example, I often remember past birthday parties, imagine that I was on vacation, desire a slice of pizza, or doubt that England will win the World Cup. Locke believes that we are able to notice or experience our mind performing these actions and when we do we receive ideas of reflection. These are ideas such as memory, imagination, desire, doubt, judgment, and choice.

Locke’s view is that experience (sensation and reflection) issues us with simple ideas. These are the minimal units of mental content; each simple idea is “in itself uncompounded, [and] contains in it nothing but one uniform Appearance, or Conception in the mind, and is not distinguishable into different Ideas.” (2.2.1, 119). But many of my ideas are not simple ideas. My idea of a glass of orange juice or my idea of the New York subway system, for example, could not be classed a simple ideas. Locke calls ideas like these complex ideas. His view is that complex ideas are the product of combining our simple ideas together in various ways. For example, my complex idea of a glass of orange juice consists of various simple ideas (the color orange, the feeling of coolness, a certain sweet taste, a certain acidic taste, and so forth) combined together into one object. Thus, Locke believes our ideas are compositional. Simple ideas combine to form complex ideas. And these complex ideas can be combined to form even more complex ideas.

We are now in a position to understand the character of Locke’s empiricism. He is committed to the view that all of our ideas, everything we can possibly think of, can be broken down into simple ideas received in experience. The bulk of Book II is devoted to making this empiricism plausible. Locke does this both by undertaking an examination of the various abilities that the human mind has (memory, abstraction, volition, and so forth) and by offering an account of how even abstruse ideas like space, infinity, God, and causation could be constructed using only the simple ideas received in experience.

Our complex ideas are classified into three different groups: substances, modes, and relations. Ideas of substances are ideas of things which are thought to exist independently. Ordinary objects like desks, sheep, and mountains fall into this group. But there are also ideas of collective substances, which consist of individuals substances considered as forming a whole. A group of individual buildings might be considered a town. And a group of individual men and women might be considered together as an army. In addition to describing the way we think about individual substances, Locke also has an interesting discussion of substance-in-general. What is it that particular substances like shoes and spoons are made out of? We could suggest that they are made out of leather and metal. But the question could be repeated, what are leather and metal made of? We might respond that they are made of matter. But even here, Locke thinks we can ask what matter is made of. What gives rise to the properties of matter? Locke claims that we don’t have a very clear idea here. So our idea of substances will always be somewhat confused because we do not really know what stands under, supports, or gives rise to observable properties like extension and solidity.

Ideas of modes are ideas of things which are dependent on substances in some way. In general, this taxonomic category can be somewhat tricky. It does not seem to have a clear parallel in contemporary metaphysics, and it is sometimes thought to be a mere catch-all category for things which are neither substances nor relations. But it is helpful to think of modes as being like features of substances; modes are “such complex Ideas, which however compounded, contain not in them the supposition of subsisting by themselves, but are considered as Dependences on, or Affections of Substances.” (2.12.4, 165). Modes come in two types: simple and mixed. Simple modes are constructed by combining a large number of a single type of simple ideas together. For example, Locke believes there is a simple idea of unity. Our complex idea of the number seven, for example, is a simple mode and is constructed by concatenating seven simple ideas of unity together. Locke uses this category to explain how we think about a number of topics relating to number, space, time, pleasure and pain, and cognition. Mixed modes, on the other hand, involve combining together simple ideas of more than one kind. A great many ideas fall into this category. But the most important ones are moral ideas. Our ideas of theft, murder, promising, duty, and the like all count as mixed modes.

Ideas of relations are ideas that involve more than one substance. My idea of a husband, for example, is more than the idea of an individual man. It also must include the idea of another substance, namely the idea of that man’s spouse. Locke is keen to point out that much more of our thought involves relations than we might previously have thought. For example, when I think about Elizabeth II as the Queen of England my thinking actually involves relations, because I cannot truly think of Elizabeth as a queen without conceiving of her as having a certain relationship of sovereignty to some subjects (individual substances like David Beckham and J.K. Rowling). Locke then goes on to explore the role that relations have in our thinking about causation, space, time, morality, and (very famously) identity.

Throughout his discussion of the different kinds of complex ideas Locke is keen to emphasize that all of our ideas can ultimately be broken down into simple ideas received in sensation and reflection. Put differently, Locke is keenly aware that the success of his empiricist theory of mind depends on its ability to account for all the contents of our minds. Whether or not Locke is successful is a matter of dispute. On some occasions the analysis he gives of how a very complex idea could be constructed using only simple ideas is vague and requires the reader to fill in some gaps. And commentators have also suggested that some of the simple ideas Locke invokes, for example the simple ideas of power and unity, do not seem to be obvious components of our phenomenological experience.

Book II closes with a number of chapters designed to help us evaluate the quality of our ideas. Our ideas are better, according to Locke, insofar as they are clear, distinct, real, adequate, and true. Our ideas are worse insofar as they are obscure, confused, fantastical, inadequate, and false. Clarity and obscurity are explained via an analogy to vision. Clear ideas, like clear images, are crisp and fresh, not faded or diminished in the way that obscure ideas (or images) are. Distinction and confusion have to do with the individuation of ideas. Ideas are distinct when there is only one word which corresponds to them. Confused ideas are ones to which more than one word can correctly apply or ones that lack a clear and consistent correlation to one particular word. To use one of Locke’s examples, an idea of a leopard as a beast with spots would be confused. It is not distinct because the word “lynx” could apply to that idea just as easily as the word “leopard.” Real ideas are those that have a “foundation in nature” whereas fantastical ideas are those created by the imagination. For example, our idea of a horse would be a real idea and our idea of a unicorn would be fantastical. Adequacy and inadequacy have to do with how well ideas match the patterns according to which they were made. Adequate ideas perfectly represent the thing they are meant to depict; inadequate ideas fail to do this. Ideas are true when the mind understands them in a way that is correct according to linguistic practices and the way the world is structured. They are false when the mind misunderstands them along these lines.

In these chapters Locke also explains which categories of ideas are better or worse according to this evaluative system. Simple ideas do very well. Because objects directly produce them in the mind they tend to be clear, distinct, and so forth. Ideas of modes and relations also tend to do very well, but for a different reason. Locke thinks that the archetypes of these ideas are in the mind rather than in the world. As such, it is easy for these ideas to be good because the mind has a clear sense of what the ideas should be like as it constructs them. By contrast, ideas of substances tend to fare very poorly. The archetypes for these ideas are external world objects. Because our perceptual access to these objects is limited in a number of ways and because these objects are so intricate, ideas of substances tend to be confused, inadequate, false, and so forth.

d. Language

Book III of the Essay is concerned with language. Locke admits that this topic is something of a digression. He did not originally plan for language to take up an entire book of the Essay. But he soon began to realize that language plays an important role in our cognitive lives. Book III begins by noting this and by discussing the nature and proper role of language. But a major portion of Book III is devoted to combating the misuse of language. Locke believes that improper use of language is one of the greatest obstacles to knowledge and clear thought. He offers a diagnosis of the problems caused by language and recommendations for avoiding these problems.

Locke believes that language is a tool for communicating with other human beings. Specifically, Locke thinks that we want to communicate about our ideas, the contents of our minds. From here it is a short step to the view that: “Words in their primary or immediate Signification, stand for nothing, but the Ideas in the Mind of him that uses them.” (3.2.2, 405). When an agent utters the word “gold” she is referring to her idea of a shiny, yellowish, malleable substance of great value. When she utters the word “carrot” she is referring to her idea of a long, skinny, orange vegetable which grows underground. Locke is, of course, aware that the names we choose for these ideas are arbitrary and merely a matter of social convention.

Although the primary use of words is to refer to ideas in the mind of the speaker, Locke also allows that words make what he calls “secret reference” to two other things. First, humans also want their words to refer to the corresponding ideas in the minds of other humans. When Smith says “carrot” within earshot of Jones her hope is that Jones also has an idea of the long, skinny vegetable and that saying “carrot” will bring that idea into Jones’ mind. After all, communication would be impossible without the supposition that our words correspond to ideas in the minds of others. Second, humans suppose that their words stand for objects in the world. When Smith says “carrot” she wants to refer to more than just her idea, she also wants to refer to the long skinny objects themselves. But Locke is suspicious of these two other ways of understanding signification. He thinks the latter one, in particular, is illegitimate.

After discussing these basic features of language and reference Locke goes on to discuss specific cases of the relationship between ideas and words: words used for simple ideas, words used for modes, words used for substances, the way in which a single word can refer to a multiplicity of ideas, and so forth. There is also an interesting chapter on “particles.” These are words which do not refer to an idea but instead refer to a certain connection which holds between ideas. For example, if I say “Secretariat is brown” the word “Secretariat” refers to my idea of a certain racehorse, and “brown” refers to my idea of a certain color, but the word “is” does something different. That word is a particle and indicates that I am expressing something about the relationship between my ideas of Secretariat and brown and suggesting that they are connected in a certain way. Other particles includes words like “and”, “but”, “hence”, and so forth.

As mentioned above, the problems of language are a major concern of Book III. Locke thinks that language can lead to confusion and misunderstanding for a number of reasons. The signification of words is arbitrary, rather than natural, and this means it can be difficult to understand which words refer to which ideas. Many of our words stand for ideas which are complex, hard to acquire, or both. So many people will struggle to use those words appropriately. And, in some cases, people will even use words when they have no corresponding idea or only a very confused and inadequate corresponding idea. Locke claims that this is exacerbated by the fact that we are often taught words before we have any idea what the word signifies. A child, for example, might be taught the word “government” at a young age, but it will take her years to form a clear idea of what governments are and how they operate. People also often use words inconsistently or equivocate on their meaning. Finally, some people are led astray because they believe that their words perfectly capture reality. Recall from above that people secretly and incorrectly use their words to refer to objects in the external world. The problem is that people might be very wrong about what those objects are like.

Locke thinks that a result of all this is that people are seriously misusing language and that many debates and discussions in important fields like science, politics, and philosophy are confused or consist of merely verbal disputes. Locke provides a number of examples of language causing problems: Cartesians using “body” and “extension” interchangeably, even though the two ideas are distinct; physiologists who agree on all the facts yet have a long dispute because they have different understandings of the word “liquor”; Scholastic philosophers using the term “prime matter” when they are unable to actually frame an idea of such a thing, and so forth.

The remedies that Locke recommends for fixing these problems created by language are somewhat predictable. But Locke is quick to point out that while they sound like easy fixes they are actually quite difficult to implement. The first and most important step is to only use words when we have clear ideas attached to them. (Again, this sounds easy, but many of us might actually struggle to come up with a clear idea corresponding to even everyday terms like “glory” or “fascist”.) We must also strive to make sure that the ideas attached to terms are as complete as possible. We must strive to ensure that we use words consistently and do not equivocate; every time we utter a word we should use it to signify one and the same idea. Finally, we should communicate our definitions of words to others.

e. The Account of Knowledge

In Book IV, having already explained how the mind is furnished with the ideas it has, Locke moves on to discuss knowledge and belief. A good place to start is with a quote from the beginning of Book IV: “Knowledge then seems to me to be nothing but the perception of the connexion and agreement, or disagreement and repugnancy of any of our Ideas. Where this Perception is, there is Knowledge, and where it is not, there, though we may fancy, guess, or believe, yet we always come short of Knowledge.” (4.2.2, 525). Locke spends the first part of Book IV clarifying and exploring this conception of knowledge. The second part focuses on how we should apportion belief in cases where we lack knowledge.

What does Locke mean by the “connection and agreement” and the “disagreement and repugnancy” of our ideas? Some examples might help. Bring to mind your idea of white and your idea of black. Locke thinks that upon doing this you will immediately perceive that they are different, they “disagree”. It is when you perceive this disagreement that you know the fact that white is not black. Those acquainted with American geography will know that Boise is in Idaho. On Locke’s account of knowledge, this means that they are able to perceive a certain connection that obtains between their idea of Idaho and their idea of Boise. Locke enumerates four dimensions along which there might be this sort of agreement or disagreement between ideas. First, we can perceive when two ideas are identical or non-identical. For example, knowing that sweetness is not bitterness consists in perceiving that the idea of sweetness is not identical to the idea of bitterness. Second, we can perceive relations that obtain between ideas. For example, knowing that 7 is greater than 3 consists in perceiving that there is a size relation of bigger and smaller between the two ideas. Third, we can perceive when our idea of a certain feature accompanies our idea of a certain thing. If I know that ice is cold this is because I perceive that my idea of cold always accompanies my idea of ice. Fourthly, we can perceive when existence agrees with any idea. I can have knowledge of this fourth kind when, for example, I perform the cogito and recognize the special relation between my idea of myself and my idea of existence. Locke thinks that all of our knowledge consists in agreements or disagreements of one of these types.

After detailing the types of relations between ideas which constitute knowledge Locke continues on to discuss three “degrees” of knowledge in 4.2. These degrees seem to consist in different ways of knowing something. The first degree Locke calls intuitive knowledge. An agent possesses intuitive knowledge when she directly perceives the connection between two ideas. This is the best kind of knowledge, as Locke says “Such kind of Truths, the Mind perceives at the first sight of the Ideas together, by bare Intuition, without the intervention of any other Idea; and this kind of knowledge is the clearest, and most certain, that humane Frailty is capable of.” (4.2.1, 531). The second degree of knowledge is called demonstrative. Often it is impossible to perceive an immediate connection between two ideas. For example, most of us are unable to tell that the three interior angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles simply by looking at them. But most of us, with the assistance of a mathematics teacher, can be made to see that they are equal by means of a geometric proof or demonstration. This is the model for demonstrative knowledge. Even if one is unable to directly perceive a relation between idea-X and idea-Y one might perceive a relation indirectly by means of idea-A and idea-B. This will be possible if the agent has intuitive knowledge of a connection between X and A, between A and B, and then between B and Y. Demonstrative knowledge consists, therefore, in a string of relations each of which is known intuitively.

The third degree of knowledge is called sensitive knowledge and has been the source of considerable debate and confusion among Locke commentators. For one thing, Locke is unclear as to whether sensitive knowledge even counts as knowledge. He writes that intuitive and demonstrative knowledge are, properly speaking, the only forms of knowledge, but that “There is, indeed, another Perception of the Mind…which going beyond bare probability, and yet not reaching perfectly to either of the foregoing degrees of certainty, passes under the name of Knowledge.” (4.2.14, 537). Sensitive knowledge has to do with the relationship between our ideas and the objects in the external world that produce them. Locke claims that we can be certain that when we perceive something, an orange, for example, there is an object in the external world which is responsible for these sensations. Part of Locke’s claim is that there is a serious qualitative difference between biting into an orange and remembering biting into an orange. There is something in the phenomenological experience of the former which assures us of a corresponding object in the external world.

Locke spends a fair amount of time in Book IV responding to worries that he is a skeptic or that his account of knowledge, with its emphasis on ideas, fails to be responsive to the external world. The general worry for Locke is fairly simple. By claiming that ideas are the only things humans have epistemic access to, and by claiming that knowledge relates only to our ideas, Locke seems to rule out the claim that we can ever know about the external world. Lockean agents are trapped behind a “veil of ideas.” Thus we cannot have any assurance that our ideas provide us with reliable information about the external world. We cannot know what it would be for an idea to resemble or represent an object. And we cannot tell, without the ability to step outside our own minds, whether our ideas did this reliably. This criticism has historically been thought to endanger Locke’s entire project. Gilbert Ryle’s memorable assessment is that “nearly every youthful student of philosophy both can and does in his second essay refute Locke’s entire Theory of Knowledge.” Recent scholarship has been much more charitable to Locke. But the central problem is still a pressing one.

Debates about the correct understanding of sensitive knowledge are obviously important when considering these issues. At first blush, the relation involved in sensitive knowledge seems to be a relation between an idea and a physical object in the world. But, if this reading is correct, then it becomes difficult to understand the many passages in which Locke insists that knowledge is a relation that holds only between ideas. Also relevant are debates about how to correctly understand Lockean ideas. Recall from above that although many understand ideas as mental objects, some understand them as mental acts. While most of the text seems to favor the first interpretation, it seems that the second interpretation has a significant advantage when responding to these skeptical worries. The reason is that the connection between ideas and external world objects is built right into the definition of an idea. An idea just is a perception of an external world object.

However the debates discussed in the previous paragraph are resolved, there is a consensus among commentators that Locke believes the scope of human understanding is very narrow. Humans are not capable of very much knowledge. Locke discusses this is 4.3, a chapter entitled “Extent of Humane Knowledge.” The fact that our knowledge is so limited should come as no surprise. We have already discussed the ways in which our ideas of substances are problematic. And we have just seen that we have no real understanding of the connection between our ideas and the objects that produce them.

The good news, however, is that while our knowledge might not be very extensive, it is sufficient for our needs. Locke’s memorable nautical metaphor holds that: “’Tis of great use to the Sailor to know the length of his Line, though he cannot with it fathom all the depths of the Ocean. ‘Tis well he knows, that it is long enough to reach the bottom, at such Places, as are necessary to direct his Voyage, and caution him against running upon Shoales, that may ruin him. Our Business here is not to know all things, but those which concern our Conduct.” (1.1.6, 46). Locke thinks we have enough knowledge to live comfortable lives on Earth, to realize that there is a God, to understand morality and behave appropriately, and to gain salvation. Our knowledge of morality, in particular, is very good. Locke even suggests that we might develop a demonstrable system of morality similar to Euclid’s demonstrable system of geometry. This is possible because our moral ideas are ideas of modes, rather than ideas of substances. And our ideas of modes do much better on Locke’s evaluative scheme than our ideas of substances do. Finally, while the limits to our knowledge might be disappointing, Locke notes that recognizing these limits is important and useful insofar as it will help us to better organize our intellectual inquiry. We will be saved from investigating questions which we could never know the answers to and can focus our efforts on areas where progress is possible.

One benefit of Locke’s somewhat bleak assessment of the scope of our knowledge was that it caused him to focus on an area which was underappreciated by many of his contemporaries. This was the arena of judgment or opinion, belief states which fall short of knowledge. Given that we have so little knowledge (that we can be certain of so little) the realm of probability becomes very important. Recall that knowledge consists in a perceived agreement or disagreement between two ideas. Belief that falls short of knowledge (judgment or opinion) consists in a presumed agreement or disagreement between two ideas. Consider an example: I am not entirely sure who the Prime Minister of Canada is, but I am somewhat confident it is Stephen Harper. Locke’s claim is that in judging that the Canadian PM is Stephen Harper I am acting as though a relation holds between the two ideas. I do not directly perceive a connection between my idea of Stephen Harper and my idea of the Canadian PM, but I presume that one exists.

After offering this account of what judgment is, Locke offers an analysis of how and why we form the opinions we do and offers some recommendations for forming our opinions responsibly. This includes a diagnosis of the errors people make in judging, a discussion of the different degrees of assent, and an interesting discussion of the epistemic value of testimony.

3. Special Topics in the Essay

As discussed above, the main project of the Essay is an examination of the human understanding and an analysis of knowledge. But the Essay is a rather expansive work and contains discussion of many other topics of philosophical interest. Some of these will be discussed below. A word of warning, however, is required before proceeding. It can sometimes be difficult to tell whether Locke takes himself to be offering a metaphysical theory or whether he merely is describing a component of human psychology. For example, we might question whether his account of personal identity is meant to give necessary and sufficient conditions for a metaphysical account of personhood or whether it is merely designed to tell us what sorts of identity attributions we do and should make and why. We may further question whether, when discussing primary and secondary qualities, Locke is offering a theory about how perception really works or whether this discussion is a mere digression used to illustrate a point about the nature of our ideas. So while many of these topics have received a great deal of attention, their precise relationship to the main project of the Essay can be difficult to locate.

a. Primary and Secondary Qualities

Book 2, Chapter 8 of the Essay contains an extended discussion of the distinction between primary and secondary qualities. Locke was hardly original in making this distinction. By the time the Essay was published, it had been made by many others and was even somewhat commonplace. That said, Locke’s formulation of the distinction and his analysis of the related issues has been tremendously influential and has provided the framework for much of the subsequent discussion on the topic.

Locke defines a quality as a power that a body has to produce ideas in us. So a simple object like a baked potato which can produce ideas of brownness, heat, ovular shape, solidity, and determinate size must have a series of corresponding qualities. There must be something in the potato which gives us the idea of brown, something in the potato which gives us the idea of ovular shape, and so on. The primary/secondary quality distinction claims that some of these qualities are very different from others.

Locke motivates the distinction between two types of qualities by discussing how a body could produce an idea in us. The theory of perception endorsed by Locke is highly mechanical. All perception occurs as a result of motion and collision. If I smell the baked potato, there must be small material particles which are flying off of the potato and bumping into nerves in my nose, the motion in the nose-nerves causes a chain reaction along my nervous system until eventually there is some motion in my brain and I experience the idea of a certain smell. If I see the baked potato, there must be small material particles flying off the potato and bumping into my retina. That bumping causes a similar chain reaction which ends in my experience of a certain roundish shape.

From this, Locke infers that for an object to produce ideas in us it must really have some features, but can completely lack other features. This mechanical theory of perception requires that objects producing ideas in us have shape, extension, mobility, and solidity. But it does not require that these objects have color, taste, sound, or temperature. So the primary qualities are qualities actually possessed by bodies. These are features that a body cannot be without. The secondary qualities, by contrast, are not really had by bodies. They are just ways of talking about the ideas that can be produced in us by bodies in virtue of their primary qualities. So when we claim that the baked potato is solid, this means that solidity is one of its fundamental features. But when I claim that it smells a certain earthy kind of way, this just means that its fundamental features are capable of producing the idea of the earthy smell in my mind.

These claims lead to Locke’s claims about resemblance: “From whence I think it is easie to draw this Observation, That the Ideas of primary Qualities of Bodies, are Resemblances of them, and their Patterns do really exist in the Bodies themselves; but the Ideas, produced in us by these Secondary Qualities, have no resemblance of them at all.” (2.8.14, 137). Insofar as my idea of the potato is of something solid, extended, mobile, and possessing a certain shape my idea accurately captures something about the real nature of the potato. But insofar as my idea of the potato is of something with a particular smell, temperature, and taste my ideas do not accurately capture mind-independent facts about the potato.

b. Mechanism

Around the time of the Essay the mechanical philosophy was emerging as the predominant theory about the physical world. The mechanical philosophy held that the fundamental entities in the physical world were small individual bodies called corpuscles. Each corpuscle was solid, extended, and had a certain shape. These corpuscles could combine together to form ordinary objects like rocks, tables, and plants. The mechanical philosophy argued that all features of bodies and all natural phenomena could be explained by appeal to these corpuscles and their basic properties (in particular, size, shape, and motion).

Locke was exposed to the mechanical philosophy while at Oxford and became acquainted with the writings of its most prominent advocates. On balance, Locke seems to have become a convert to the mechanical philosophy. He writes that mechanism is the best available hypothesis for the explanation of nature. We have already seen some of the explanatory work done by mechanism in the Essay. The distinction between primary and secondary qualities was a hallmark of the mechanical philosophy and neatly dovetailed with mechanist accounts of perception. Locke reaffirms his commitment to this account of perception at a number of other points in the Essay. And when discussing material objects Locke is very often happy to allow that they are composed of material corpuscles. What is peculiar, however, is that while the Essay does seem to have a number of passages in which Locke supports mechanical explanations and speaks highly of mechanism, it also contains some highly critical remarks about mechanism and discussions of the limits of the mechanical philosophy.

Locke’s critiques of mechanism can be divided into two strands. First, he recognized that there were a number of observed phenomena which mechanism struggled to explain. Mechanism did offer neat explanations of some observed phenomena. For example, the fact that objects could be seen but not smelled through glass could be explained by positing that the corpuscles which interacted with our retinas were smaller than the ones which interacted with our nostrils. So the sight corpuscles could pass through the spaces between the glass corpuscles, but the smell corpuscles would be turned away. But other phenomena were harder to explain. Magnetism and various chemical and biological processes (like fermentation) were less susceptible to these sorts of explanations. And universal gravitation, which Locke took Newton to have proved the existence of in the Principia, was particularly hard to explain. Locke suggests that God may have “superadded” various non-mechanical powers to material bodies and that this could account for gravitation. (Indeed, at several points he even suggests that God may have superadded the power of thought to matter and that humans might be purely material beings.)

Locke’s second set of critiques pertain to theoretical problems in the mechanical philosophy. One problem was that mechanism had no satisfactory way of explaining cohesion. Why do corpuscles sometimes stick together? If things like tables and chairs are just collections of small corpuscles then they should be very easy to break apart, the same way I can easily separate one group of marbles from another. Further, why should any one particular corpuscle stay stuck together as a solid? What accounts for its cohesion? Again, mechanism seems hard-pressed to offer an answer. Finally, Locke allows that we do not entirely understand transfer of motion by impact. When one corpuscle collides with another we actually do not have a very satisfying explanation for why the second moves away under the force of the impact.

Locke presses these critiques with some skill and in a serious manner. Still, ultimately he is guardedly optimistic about mechanism. This somewhat mixed attitude on Locke’s part has led commentators to debate questions about his exact attitude toward the mechanical philosophy and his motivations for discussing it.

c. Volition and Agency

In Book 2, Chapter 21 of the Essay Locke explores the topic of the will. One of the things which separates people from rocks and billiard balls is our ability to make decisions and control our actions. We feel that we are free in certain respects and that we have the power to choose certain thoughts and actions. Locke calls this power the will. But there are tricky questions about what this power consists in and about what it takes to freely (or voluntarily) choose something. 2.21 contains a delicate and sustained discussion of these tricky questions.

Locke first begins with questions of freedom and then proceeds to a discussion of the will. On Locke’s analysis, we are free to do those things which we both will to do and are physically capable of doing. For example, if I wish to jump into a lake and have no physical maladies which prevent it, then I am free to jump into the lake. By contrast, if I do not wish to jump into the lake, but a friend pushes me in, I did not act freely when I entered the water. Or, if I wish to jump into the lake, but have a spinal injury and cannot move my body, then I do not act freely when I stay on the shore. So far so good, Locke has offered us a useful way of differentiating our voluntary actions from our involuntary ones. But there is still a pressing question about freedom and the will: that of whether the will is itself free. When I am deciding whether or not to jump into the water, is the will determined by outside factors to choose one or the other? Or can it, so to speak, make up its own mind and choose either option?

Locke’s initial position in the chapter is that the will is determined. But in later sections he offers a qualification of sorts. In normal circumstances, the will is determined by what Locke calls uneasiness: “What is it that determines the Will in regard to our Actions? … some (and for the most part the most pressing) uneasiness a Man is at present under. That is that which successively determines the Will, and sets us upon those Actions, we perform.” (2.21.31, 250-1). The uneasiness is caused by the absence of something that is perceived as good. The perception of the thing as good gives rise to a desire for that thing. Suppose I choose to eat a slice of pizza. Locke would say I must have made this choice because the absence of the pizza was troubling me somehow (I was feeling hunger pains, or longing for something savory) and this discomfort gave rise to a desire for food. That desire in turn determined my will to choose to eat pizza.

Locke’s qualification to this account of the will being determined by uneasiness has to do with what he calls suspension. Beginning with the second edition of the Essay, Locke began to argue that the most pressing desire for the most part determines the will, but not always: “For the mind having in most cases, as is evident in Experience, a power to suspend the execution and satisfaction of any of its desires, and so all, one after another, is at liberty to consider the objects of them; examine them on all sides, and weigh them with others.” (2.21.47, 263). So even if, at this moment, my desire for pizza is the strongest desire, Locke thinks I can pause before I decide to eat the pizza and consider the decision. I can consider other items in my desire set: my desire to lose weight, or to leave the pizza for my friend, or to keep a vegan diet. Careful consideration of these other possibilities might have the effect of changing my desire set. If I really focus on how important it is to stay fit and healthy by eating nutritious foods then my desire to leave the pizza might become stronger than my desire to eat it and my will may be determined to choose to not eat the pizza. But of course we can always ask whether a person has a choice whether or not to suspend judgment or whether the suspension of judgment is itself determined by the mind’s strongest desire. On this point Locke is somewhat vague. While most interpreters think our desires determine when judgment is suspended, some others disagree and argue that suspension of judgment offers Lockean agents a robust form of free will.

d. Personhood and Personal Identity

Locke was one of the first philosophers to give serious attention to the question of personal identity. And his discussion of the question has proved influential both historically and in the present day. The discussion occurs in the midst of Locke’ larger discussion of the identity conditions for various entities in Book II, Chapter 27. At heart, the question is simple, what makes me the same person as the person who did certain things in the past and that will do certain things in the future? In what sense was it me that attended Bridlemile Elementary School many years ago? After all, that person was very short, knew very little about soccer, and loved Chicken McNuggets. I, on the other hand, am average height, know tons of soccer trivia, and get rather queasy at the thought of eating chicken, especially in nugget form. Nevertheless, it is true that I am identical to the boy who attended Bridlemile.

In Locke’s time, the topic of personal identity was important for religious reasons. Christian doctrine held that there was an afterlife in which virtuous people would be rewarded in heaven and sinful people would be punished in hell. This scheme provided motivation for individuals to behave morally. But, for this to work, it was important that the person who is rewarded or punished is the same person as the one who lived virtuously or lived sinfully. And this had to be true even though the person being rewarded or punished had died, had somehow continued to exist in an afterlife, and had somehow managed to be reunited with a body. So it was important to get the issue of personal identity right.

Locke’s views on personal identity involve a negative project and a positive project. The negative project involves arguing against the view that personal identity consists in or requires the continued existence of a particular substance. And the positive project involves defending the view that personal identity consists in continuity of consciousness. We can begin with this positive view. Locke defines a person as “a thinking intelligent Being, that has reason and reflection, and can consider itself as itself, the same thinking thing in different times and places; which it does only by that consciousness, which is inseparable from thinking, and as it seems to me essential to it.” (2.27.9, 335). Locke suggests here that part of what makes a person the same through time is their ability to recognize past experiences as belonging to them. For me, part of what differentiates one little boy who attended Bridlemile Elementary from all the other children who went there is my realization that I share in his consciousness. Put differently, my access to his lived experience at Bridlemile is very different from my access to the lived experiences of others there: it is first-personal and immediate. I recognize his experiences there as part of a string of experiences that make up my life and join up to my current self and current experiences in a unified way. That is what makes him the same person as me.

Locke believes that this account of personal identity as continuity of consciousness obviates the need for an account of personal identity given in terms of substances. A traditional view held that there was a metaphysical entity, the soul, which guaranteed personal identity through time; wherever there was the same soul, the same person would be there as well. Locke offers a number of thought experiments to cast doubt on this belief and show that his account is superior. For example, if a soul was wiped clean of all its previous experiences and given new ones (as might be the case if reincarnation were true), the same soul would not justify the claim that all of those who had had it were the same person. Or, we could imagine two souls who had their conscious experiences completely swapped. In this case, we would want to say that the person went with the conscious experiences and did not remain with the soul.

Locke’s account of personal identity seems to be a deliberate attempt to move away from some of the metaphysical alternatives and to offer an account which would be acceptable to individuals from a number of different theological backgrounds. Of course, a number of serious challenges have been raised for Locke’s account.. Most of these focus on the crucial role seemingly played by memory. And the precise details of Locke’s positive proposal in 2.27 have been hard to pin down. Nevertheless, many contemporary philosophers believe that there is an important kernel of truth in Locke’s analysis.

e. Real and Nominal Essences

Locke’s distinction between the real essence of a substance and the nominal essence of a substance is one of the most fascinating components of the Essay. Scholastic philosophers had held that the main goal of metaphysics and science was to learn about the essences of things: the key metaphysical components of things which explained all of their interesting features. Locke thought this project was misguided. That sort of knowledge, knowledge of the real essences of beings, was unavailable to human beings. This led Locke to suggest an alternative way to understand and investigate nature; he recommends focusing on the nominal essences of things.

When Locke introduces the term real essence he uses it to refer to the “real constitution of any Thing, which is the foundation of all those Properties, that are combined in, and are constantly found to co-exist with [an object]” (3.6.6, 442). For the Scholastics this real essence would be an object’s substantial form. For proponents of the mechanical philosophy it would be the number and arrangement of the material corpuscles which composed the body. Locke sometimes endorses this latter understanding of real essence. But he insists that these real essences are entirely unknown and undiscoverable by us. The nominal essences, by contrast, are known and are the best way we have to understand individual substances. Nominal essences are just collections of all the observed features an individual thing has. So the nominal essence of a piece of gold would include the ideas of yellowness, a certain weight, malleability, dissolvability in certain chemicals, and so on.

Locke offers us a helpful analogy to illustrate the difference between real and nominal essences. He suggests that our position with respect to ordinary objects is like the position of someone looking at a very complicated clock. The gears, wheels, weights, and pendulum that produce the motions of the hands on the clock face (the clock’s real essence) are unknown to the person. They are hidden behind the casing. He or she can only know about the observable features like the clock’s shape, the movement of the hands, and the chiming of the hours (the clock’s nominal essence). Similarly, when I look at an object like a dandelion, I am only able to observe its nominal essence (the yellow color, the bitter smell, and so forth). I have no clear idea what produces these features of the dandelion or how they are produced.

Locke’s views on real and nominal essences have important consequences for his views about the division of objects into groups and sorts. Why do we consider some things to be zebras and other things to be rabbits? Locke’s view is that we group according to nominal essence, not according to (unknown) real essence. But this has the consequence that our groupings might fail to adequately reflect whatever real distinctions there might be in nature. So Locke is not a realist about species or types. Instead, he is a conventionalist. We project these divisions on the world when we choose to classify objects as falling under the various nominal essences we’ve created.

f. Religious Epistemology

The epistemology of religion (claims about our understanding of God and our duties with respect to him) were tremendously contentious during Locke’s lifetime. The English Civil War, fought during Locke’s youth, was in large part a disagreement over the right way to understand the Christian religion and the requirements of religious faith. Throughout the seventeenth century, a number of fundamentalist Christian sects continually threatened the stability of English political life. And the status of Catholic and Jewish people in England was a vexed one.

So the stakes were very high when, in 4.18, Locke discussed the nature of faith and reason and their respective domains. He defines reason as an attempt to discover certainty or probability through the use of our natural faculties in the investigation of the world. Faith, by contrast, is certainty or probability attained through a communication believed to have come, originally, from God. So when Smith eats a potato chip and comes to believe it is salty, she believes this according to reason. But when Smith believes that Joshua made the sun stand still in the sky because she read it in the Bible (which she takes to be divine revelation), she believes according to faith.

Although it initially sounds as though Locke has carved out quite separate roles for faith and reason, it must be noted that these definitions make faith subordinate to reason in a subtle way. For, as Locke explains: “Whatever GOD hath revealed, is certainly true; no Doubt can be made of it. This is the proper Object of Faith: But whether it be a divine Revelation, or no, Reason must judge; which can never permit the Mind to reject a greater Evidence to embrace what is less evident, nor allow it to entertain Probability in opposition to Knowledge and Certainty.” (4.18.10, 695). First, Locke thinks that if any proposition, even one which purports to be divinely revealed, clashes with the clear evidence of reason then it should not be believed. So, even if it seems like God is telling us that 1+1=3, Locke claims we should go on believing that 1+1=2 and we should deny that the 1+1=3 revelation was genuine. Second, Locke thinks that to determine whether or not something is divinely revealed we have to exercise our reason. How can we tell whether the Bible contains God’s direct revelation conveyed through the inspired Biblical authors or whether it is instead the work of mere humans? Only reason can help us settle that question. Locke thinks that those who ignore the importance of reason in determining what is and is not a matter of faith are guilty of “enthusiasm.” And in a chapter added to later editions of the Essay Locke sternly warns his readers against the serious dangers posed by this intellectual vice.

In all of this Locke emerges as a strong moderate. He himself was deeply religious and took religious faith to be important. But he also felt that there were serious limits to what could be justified through appeals to faith. The issues discussed in this section will be very important below where Locke’s views on the importance of religious toleration are discussed.

4. Political Philosophy

Locke lived during a very eventful time in English politics. The Civil War, Interregnum, Restoration, Exclusion Crisis, and Glorious Revolution all happened during his lifetime. For much of his life Locke held administrative positions in government and paid very careful attention to contemporary debates in political theory. So it is perhaps unsurprising that he wrote a number of works on political issues. In this field, Locke is best known for his arguments in favor of religious toleration and limited government. Today these ideas are commonplace and widely accepted. But in Locke’s time they were highly innovative, even radical.

a. The Two Treatises

Locke’s Two Treatises of Government were published in 1689. It was originally thought that they were intended to defend the Glorious Revolution and William’s seizure of the throne. We now know, however, that they were in fact composed much earlier. Nonetheless, they do lay out a view of government amenable to many of William’s supporters.

The First Treatise is now of primarily historical interest. It takes the form of a detailed critique of a work called Patriacha by Robert Filmer. Filmer had argued, in a rather unsophisticated way, in favor of divine right monarchy. On his view, the power of kings ultimately originated in the dominion which God gave to Adam and which had passed down in an unbroken chain through the ages. Locke disputes this picture on a number of historical grounds. Perhaps more importantly, Locke also distinguishes between a number of different types of dominion or governing power which Filmer had run together.

After clearing some ground in the First Treatise, Locke offers a positive view of the nature of government in the much better known Second Treatise. Part of Locke’s strategy in this work was to offer a different account of the origins of government. While Filmer had suggested that humans had always been subject to political power, Locke argues for the opposite. According to him, humans were initially in a state of nature. The state of nature was apolitical in the sense that there were no governments and each individual retained all of his or her natural rights. People possessed these natural rights (including the right to attempt to preserve one’s life, to seize unclaimed valuables, and so forth) because they were given by God to all of his people.

The state of nature was inherently unstable. Individuals would be under constant threat of physical harm. And they would be unable to pursue any goals that required stability and widespread cooperation with other humans. Locke’s claim is that government arose in this context. Individuals, seeing the benefits which could be gained, decided to relinquish some of their rights to a central authority while retaining other rights. This took the form of a contract. In agreement for relinquishing certain rights, individuals would receive protection from physical harm, security for their possessions, and the ability to interact and cooperate with other humans in a stable environment.

So, according to this view, governments were instituted by the citizens of those governments. This has a number of very important consequences. On this view, rulers have an obligation to be responsive to the needs and desires of these citizens. Further, in establishing a government the citizens had relinquished some, but not all of their original rights. So no ruler could claim absolute power over all elements of a citizen’s life. This carved out important room for certain individual rights or liberties. Finally, and perhaps most importantly, a government which failed to adequately protect the rights and interests of its citizens or a government which attempted to overstep its authority would be failing to perform the task for which it was created. As such, the citizens would be entitled to revolt and replace the existing government with one which would suitably carry out the duties of ensuring peace and civil order while respecting individual rights.

So Locke was able to use the account of natural rights and a government created through contract to accomplish a number of important tasks. He could use it to show why individuals retain certain rights even when they are subject to a government. He could use it to show why despotic governments which attempted to unduly infringe on the rights of their citizens were bad. And he could use it to show that citizens had a right to revolt in instances where governments failed in certain ways. These are powerful ideas which remain important even today.

For more. see the article Political Philosophy.

b. Property

Locke’s Second Treatise on government contains an influential account of the nature of private property. According to Locke, God gave humans the world and its contents to have in common. The world was to provide humans with what was necessary for the continuation and enjoyment of life. But Locke also believed it was possible for individuals to appropriate individual parts of the world and justly hold them for their own exclusive use. Put differently, Locke believed that we have a right to acquire private property.

Locke’s claim is that we acquire property by mixing our labor with some natural resource. For example, if I discover some grapes growing on a vine, through my labor in picking and collecting these grapes I acquire an ownership right over them. If I find an empty field and then use my labor to plow the field then plant and raise crops, I will be the proper owner of those crops. If I chop down trees in an unclaimed forest and use the wood to fashion a table, then that table will be mine. Locke places two important limitations on the way in which property can be acquired by mixing one’s labor with natural resources. First, there is what has come to be known as the Waste Proviso. One must not take so much property that some of it goes to waste. I should not appropriate gallons and gallons of grapes if I am only able to eat a few and the rest end up rotting. If the goods of the Earth were given to us by God, it would be inappropriate to allow some of this gift to go to waste. Second, there is the Enough-And-As-Good Proviso. This says that in appropriating resources I am required to leave enough and as good for others to appropriate. If the world was left to us in common by God, it would be wrong of me to appropriate more than my fair share and fail to leave sufficient resources for others.

After currency is introduced and after governments are established the nature of property obviously changes a great deal. Using metal, which can be made into coins and which does not perish the way foodstuffs and other goods do, individuals are able to accumulate much more wealth than would be possible otherwise. So the proviso concerning waste seems to drop away. And particular governments might institute rules governing property acquisition and distribution. Locke was aware of this and devoted a great deal of thought to the nature of property and the proper distribution of property within a commonwealth. His writings on economics, monetary policy, charity, and social welfare systems are evidence of this. But Locke’s views on property inside of a commonwealth have received far less attention than his views on the original acquisition of property in the state of nature.

c. Toleration

Locke had been systematically thinking about issues relating to religious toleration since his early years in London and even though he only published his Epistola de Tolerantia (A Letter Concerning Toleration) in 1689 he had finished writing it several years before. The question of whether or not a state should attempt to prescribe one particular religion within the state, what means states might use to do so, and what the correct attitude should be toward those who resist conversion to the official state religion had been central to European politics ever since the Protestant Reformation. Locke’s time in England, France, and the Netherlands had given him experiences of three very different approaches to these questions. These experiences had convinced him that, for the most part, individuals should be allowed to practice their religion without interference from the state. Indeed, part of the impetus for the publication of Locke’s Letter Concerning Toleration came from Louis XIV’s revocation of the Edict of Nantes, which took away the already limited rights of Protestants in France and exposed them to state persecution.

It is possible to see Locke’s arguments in favor of toleration as relating both to the epistemological views of the Essay and the political views of the Two Treatises. Relating to Locke’s epistemological views, recall from above that Locke thought the scope of human knowledge was extremely restricted. We might not be particularly good at determining what the correct religion is. There is no reason to think that those holding political power will be any better at discovering the true religion than anyone else, so they should not attempt to enforce their views on others. Instead, each individual should be allowed to pursue true beliefs as best as they are able. Little harm results from allowing others to have their own religious beliefs. Indeed, it might be beneficial to allow a plurality of beliefs because one group might end up with the correct beliefs and win others over to their side.

Relating to Locke’s political views, as expressed in the Two Treatises, Locke endorses toleration on the grounds that the enforcement of religious conformity is outside the proper scope of government. People consent to governments for the purpose of establishing social order and the rule of law. Governments should refrain from enforcing religious conformity because doing so is unnecessary and irrelevant for these ends. Indeed, attempting to enforce conformity may positively harm these ends as it will likely lead to resistance from members of prohibited religions. Locke also suggests that governments should tolerate the religious beliefs of individual citizens because enforcing religious belief is actually impossible. Acceptance of a certain religion is an inward act, a function of one’s beliefs. But governments are designed to control people’s actions. So governments are, in many ways, ill-equipped to enforce the adoption of a particular religion because individual people have an almost perfect control of their own thoughts.

While Locke’s views on toleration were very progressive for the time and while his views do have an affinity with our contemporary consensus on the value of religious toleration it is important to recognize that Locke did place some severe limits on toleration. He did not think that we should tolerate the intolerant, those who would seek to forcibly impose their religious views on others. Similarly, any religious group who posed a threat to political stability or public safety should not be tolerated. Importantly, Locke included Roman Catholics in this group. On his view, Catholics had a fundamental allegiance to the Pope, a foreign prince who did not recognize the sovereignty of English law. This made Catholics a threat to civil government and peace. Finally, Locke also believed that atheists should not be tolerated. Because they did not believe they would be rewarded or punished for their actions in an afterlife, Locke did not think they could be trusted to behave morally or maintain their contractual obligations.

5. Theology

We have already seen that in the Essay Locke developed an account of belief according to faith and belief according to reason. Recall that an agent believes according to reason when she discovers something through the use of her natural faculties and she believes according to faith when she takes something as truth because she understands it to be a message from God. Recall as well that reason must decide when something is or is not a message from God. The goal of Locke’s The Reasonableness of Christianity is to show that it is reasonable to be a Christian. Locke argues that we do have sufficient reason to think that the central truths of Christianity were communicated to us by God through his messenger, Jesus of Nazareth.

For Locke’s project to succeed he needed to show that Jesus provided his original followers with sufficient evidence that he was a legitimate messenger from God. Given that numerous individuals in history had purported to be the recipients of divine revelation, there must be something special which set Jesus apart. Locke offers two considerations in this regard. The first is that Jesus fulfilled a number of historical predictions concerning the coming of a Messiah. The second is that Jesus performed a number of miracles which attest that he had a special relationship to God. Locke also claims that we have sufficient reason to believe that these miracles actually occurred on the basis of testimony from those who witnessed them first-hand and a reliable chain of reporting from Jesus’ time into our own. This argument leads Locke into a discussion of the types and value of testimony which many philosophers have found to be interesting in its own right.

One striking feature of The Reasonableness of Christianity is the requirement for salvation that Locke endorses. Disputes about which precise beliefs were necessary for salvation and eternal life in Heaven were at the core of much religious disagreement in Locke’s time. Different denominations and sects claimed that they, and often only they, had the correct beliefs. Locke, by contrast, argued that to be a true Christian and worthy of salvation an individual only need to believe one simple truth: that Jesus is the Messiah. Of course, Locke believed there were many other important truths in the Bible. But he thought these other truths, especially those contained in the Epistles rather than the Gospels, could be difficult to interpret and could lead to disputes and disagreement. The core tenet of Christianity, however, that Jesus is the Messiah, was a mandatory belief.

In making the requirements for Christian faith and salvation so minimal Locke was part of a growing faction in the Church of England. These individuals, often known as latitudinarians, were deliberately attempting to construct a more irenic Christianity with the goal of avoiding the conflict and controversy that previous internecine fights had produced. So Locke was hardly alone in attempting to find a set of core Christian commitments which were free of sectarian theological baggage. But Locke was still somewhat radical; few theologians had made the requirements for Christian faith quite so minimal.

6. Education

Locke was regarded by many in his time as an expert on educational matters. He taught many students at Oxford and also served as a private tutor. Locke’s correspondence shows that he was constantly asked to recommend tutors and offer pedagogical advice. Locke’s expertise led to his most important work on the subject: Some Thoughts Concerning Education. The work had its origins in a series of letters Locke wrote to Edward Clarke offering advice on the education of Clarke’s children and was first published in 1693.

Locke’s views on education were, for the time, quite forward-looking. Classical languages, usually learned through tedious exercises involving rote memorization, and corporeal punishment were two predominant features of the seventeenth century English educational system. Locke saw little use for either. Instead, he emphasized the importance of teaching practical knowledge. He recognized that children learn best when they are engaged with the subject matter. Locke also foreshadowed some contemporary pedagogical views by suggesting that children should be allowed some self-direction in their course of study and should have the ability to pursue their interests.

Locke believed it was important to take great care in educating the young. He recognized that habits and prejudices formed in youth could be very hard to break in later life. Thus, much of Some Thoughts Concerning Education focuses on morality and the best ways to inculcate virtue and industry. Locke rejected authoritarian approaches. Instead, he favored methods that would help children to understand the difference between right and wrong and to cultivate a moral sense of their own.

7. Locke’s Influence

The Essay was quickly recognized as an important philosophical contribution both by its admirers and by its critics. Before long it had been incorporated into the curriculum at Oxford and Cambridge and its translation into both Latin and French garnered it an audience on the Continent as well. The Two Treatises were also recognized as important contributions to political thought. While the work had some success in England among those favorably disposed to the Glorious Revolution, its primary impact was abroad. During the American Revolution (and to a lesser extent, during the French Revolution) Locke’s views were often appealed to by those seeking to establish more representative forms of government.

Related to this last point, Locke came to be seen, alongside his friend Newton, as an embodiment of Enlightenment values and ideals. Newtonian science would lay bare the workings of nature and lead to important technological advances. Lockean philosophy would lay bare the workings of men’s minds and lead to important reforms in law and government. Voltaire played an instrumental role in shaping this legacy for Locke and worked hard to publicize Locke’s views on reason, toleration, and limited government. Locke also came to be seen as an inspiration for the Deist movement. Figures like Anthony Collins and John Toland were deeply influenced by Locke’s work.

Locke is often recognized as the founder of British Empiricism and it is true that Locke laid the foundation for much of English-language philosophy in the 18^th and early 19^th centuries. But those who followed in his footsteps were not unquestioning followers. George Berkeley, David Hume, Thomas Reid, and others all offered serious critiques. In recent decades, readers have attempted to offer more charitable reconstructions of Locke’s philosophy. Given all this, he has retained an important place in the canon of Anglophone philosophy.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Locke’s Works

Laslett, P. [ed.] 1988. Two Treatises of Government. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Locke, J. 1823. The Works of John Locke. London: Printed for T. Tegg (10 volumes).
Locke, J. The Clarendon Edition of the Works of John Locke, Oxford University Press, 2015. This edition includes the following volumes:
Nidditch, P. [ed.] 1975. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Nidditch, P. and G.A.J. Rogers [eds.] 1990. Drafts for the Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Yolton, J.W. and J.S. Yolton. [eds.] 1989. Some Thoughts Concerning Education.
Higgins-Biddle, J.C. [ed.] 1999. The Reasonableness of Christianity.
Milton, J.R. and P. Milton. [eds.] 2006. An Essay Concerning Toleration.
de Beer, E.S. [ed.] 1976-1989. The Correspondence of John Locke. (8 volumes).
von Leyden, W. [ed.] 1954. Essays on the Law of Nature. Oxford: Clarendon Press.

b. Recommended Reading

The following are recommendations for further reading on Locke. Each work has a brief statement indicating the contents

Anstey, P. 2011. John Locke & Natural Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
A thorough examination of Locke’s scientific and medical thinking.
Ayers, M. 1993. Locke: Epistemology and Ontology. New York: Routledge.
A classic in Locke studies. Explores philosophical topics in the Essay and discusses Locke’s project as a whole. One volume on epistemology and one on metaphysics.
Chappell, V. 1994. The Cambridge Companion to Locke. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
A series of essays focusing on all aspects of Locke’s thought.
LoLordo, A. 2012. Locke’s Moral Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
An exploration and discussion of themes at the intersection of Locke’s moral and political thought. Focuses particularly on agency, personhood, and rationality.
Lowe, E.J. 2005. Locke. New York: Routledge.
An introductory overview of Locke’s philosophical and political thought.
Mackie, J.L. 1976. Problems from Locke. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Uses Locke’s work to raise and discuss a number of philosophical issues and puzzles.
Newman, L. 2007. The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
A series of essays focusing on specific issues in Locke’s Essay.
Pyle, A.J. 2013. Locke. London: Polity.
An excellent and brief introduction to Locke’s thought and historical context. A very good place to start for beginners.
Rickless, S. 2014. Locke. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
An introductory overview of Locke’s philosophical and political thought.
Stuart, M. 2013. Locke’s Metaphysics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
An in-depth treatment of metaphysical issues and problems in the Essay.
Waldron, J. 2002. God, Locke, and Equality: Christian Foundation of Locke’s Political Thought. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
An examination of some key issues in Locke’s political thought.
Woolhouse, R. 2009. Locke: A Biography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
The best and most recent biography of Locke’s life.

Author Information

Patrick J. Connolly
Email: pac317@lehigh.edu
Lehigh University
U. S. A.

Act and Rule Utilitarianism

Utilitarianism is one of the best known and most influential moral theories. Like other forms of consequentialism, its core idea is that whether actions are morally right or wrong depends on their effects. More specifically, the only effects of actions that are relevant are the good and bad results that they produce. A key point in this article concerns the distinction between individual actions and types of actions. Act utilitarians focus on the effects of individual actions (such as John Wilkes Booth’s assassination of Abraham Lincoln) while rule utilitarians focus on the effects of types of actions (such as killing or stealing).

Utilitarians believe that the purpose of morality is to make life better by increasing the amount of good things (such as pleasure and happiness) in the world and decreasing the amount of bad things (such as pain and unhappiness). They reject moral codes or systems that consist of commands or taboos that are based on customs, traditions, or orders given by leaders or supernatural beings. Instead, utilitarians think that what makes a morality be true or justifiable is its positive contribution to human (and perhaps non-human) beings.

The most important classical utilitarians are Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832) and John Stuart Mill (1806-1873). Bentham and Mill were both important theorists and social reformers. Their theory has had a major impact both on philosophical work in moral theory and on approaches to economic, political, and social policy. Although utilitarianism has always had many critics, there are many 21^st century thinkers that support it.

The task of determining whether utilitarianism is the correct moral theory is complicated because there are different versions of the theory, and its supporters disagree about which version is correct. This article focuses on perhaps the most important dividing line among utilitarians, the clash between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism. After a brief overall explanation of utilitarianism, the article explains both act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism, the main differences between them, and some of the key arguments for and against each view.

Utilitarianism: Overall View
How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ
Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
1. Arguments for Rule Utilitarianism
  1. Why Rule Utilitarianism Maximizes Utility
  2. Rule Utilitarianism Avoids the Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism
2. Arguments against Rule Utilitarianism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Utilitarianism: Overall View

Utilitarianism is a philosophical view or theory about how we should evaluate a wide range of things that involve choices that people face. Among the things that can be evaluated are actions, laws, policies, character traits, and moral codes. Utilitarianism is a form of consequentialism because it rests on the idea that it is the consequences or results of actions, laws, policies, etc. that determine whether they are good or bad, right or wrong. In general, whatever is being evaluated, we ought to choose the one that will produce the best overall results. In the language of utilitarians, we should choose the option that “maximizes utility,” i.e. that action or policy that produces the largest amount of good.

Utilitarianism appears to be a simple theory because it consists of only one evaluative principle: Do what produces the best consequences. In fact, however, the theory is complex because we cannot understand that single principle unless we know (at least) three things: a) what things are good and bad; b) whose good (i.e. which individuals or groups) we should aim to maximize; and c) whether actions, policies, etc. are made right or wrong by their actual consequences (the results that our actions actually produce) or by their foreseeable consequences (the results that we predict will occur based on the evidence that we have).

a. What is Good?

Jeremy Bentham answered this question by adopting the view called hedonism. According to hedonism, the only thing that is good in itself is pleasure (or happiness). Hedonists do not deny that many different kinds of things can be good, including food, friends, freedom, and many other things, but hedonists see these as “instrumental” goods that are valuable only because they play a causal role in producing pleasure or happiness. Pleasure and happiness, however, are “intrinsic” goods, meaning that they are good in themselves and not because they produce some further valuable thing. Likewise, on the negative side, a lack of food, friends, or freedom is instrumentally bad because it produces pain, suffering, and unhappiness; but pain, suffering and unhappiness are intrinsically bad, i.e. bad in themselves and not because they produce some further bad thing.

Many thinkers have rejected hedonism because pleasure and pain are sensations that we feel, claiming that many important goods are not types of feelings. Being healthy or honest or having knowledge, for example, are thought by some people to be intrinsic goods that are not types of feelings. (People who think there are many such goods are called pluralists or“objective list” theorists.) Other thinkers see desires or preferences as the basis of value; whatever a person desires is valuable to that person. If desires conflict, then the things most strongly preferred are identified as good.

In this article, the term “well-being” will generally be used to identify what utilitarians see as good or valuable in itself. All utilitarians agree that things are valuable because they tend to produce well-being or diminish ill-being, but this idea is understood differently by hedonists, objective list theorists, and preference/desire theorists. This debate will not be further discussed in this article.

b. Whose Well-being?

Utilitarian reasoning can be used for many different purposes. It can be used both for moral reasoning and for any type of rational decision-making. In addition to applying in different contexts, it can also be used for deliberations about the interests of different persons and groups.

i. Individual Self-interest

(See egoism.) When individuals are deciding what to do for themselves alone, they consider only their own utility. For example, if you are choosing ice cream for yourself, the utilitarian view is that you should choose the flavor that will give you the most pleasure. If you enjoy chocolate but hate vanilla, you should choose chocolate for the pleasure it will bring and avoid vanilla because it will bring displeasure. In addition, if you enjoy both chocolate and strawberry, you should predict which flavor will bring you more pleasure and choose whichever one will do that.

In this case, because utilitarian reasoning is being applied to a decision about which action is best for an individual person, it focuses only on how the various possible choices will affect this single person’s interest and does not consider the interests of other people.

ii. Groups

People often need to judge what is best not only for themselves or other individuals but alsowhat is best for groups, such as friends, families, religious groups, one’s country, etc. Because Bentham and other utilitarians were interested in political groups and public policies, they often focused on discovering which actions and policies would maximize the well-being of the relevant group. Their method for determining the well-being of a group involved adding up the benefits and losses that members of the group would experience as a result of adopting one action or policy. The well-being of the group is simply the sum total of the interests of the all of its members.

To illustrate this method, suppose that you are buying ice cream for a party that ten people will attend. Your only flavor options are chocolate and vanilla, and some of the people attending like chocolate while others like vanilla. As a utilitarian, you should choose the flavor that will result in the most pleasure for the group as a whole. If seven like chocolate and three like vanilla and if all of them get the same amount of pleasure from the flavor they like, then you should choose chocolate. This will yield what Bentham, in a famous phrase, called “the greatest happiness for the greatest number.”

An important point in this case is that you should choose chocolate even if you are one of the three people who enjoy vanilla more than chocolate. The utilitarian method requires you to count everyone’s interests equally. You may not weigh some people’s interests—including your own—more heavily than others. Similarly, if a government is choosing a policy, it should give equal consideration to the well-being of all members of the society.

iii. Everyone Affected

While there are circumstances in which the utilitarian analysis focuses on the interests of specific individuals or groups, the utilitarian moral theory requires that moral judgments be based on what Peter Singer calls the “equal consideration of interests.” Utilitarianism moral theory then, includes the important idea that when we calculate the utility of actions, laws, or policies, we must do so from an impartial perspective and not from a “partialist” perspective that favors ourselves, our friends, or others we especially care about. Bentham is often cited as the source of a famous utilitarian axiom: “every man to count for one, nobody for more than one.”

If this impartial perspective is seen as necessary for a utilitarian morality, then both self-interest and partiality to specific groups will be rejected as deviations from utilitarian morality. For example, so-called “ethical egoism,” which says that morality requires people to promote their own interest, would be rejected either as a false morality or as not a morality at all. While a utilitarian method for determining what people’s interests are may show that it is rational for people to maximize their own well-being or the well-being of groups that they favor, utilitarian morality would reject this as a criterion for determining what is morally right or wrong.

c. Actual Consequences or Foreseeable Consequences?

Utilitarians disagree about whether judgments of right and wrong should be based on the actual consequences of actions or their foreseeable consequences. This issue arises when the actual effects of actions differ from what we expected. J. J. C. Smart (49) explains this difference by imagining the action of a person who, in 1938,saves someone from drowning. While we generally regard saving a drowning person as the right thing to do and praise people for such actions, in Smart’s imagined example, the person saved from drowning turns out to be Adolf Hitler. Had Hitler drowned, millions of other people might have been saved from suffering and death between 1938 and 1945. If utilitarianism evaluates the rescuer’s action based on its actual consequences, then the rescuer did the wrong thing. If, however, utilitarians judge the rescuer’s action by its foreseeable consequences (i.e. the ones the rescuer could reasonably predict), then the rescuer—who could not predict the negative effects of saving the person from drowning—did the right thing.

One reason for adopting foreseeable consequence utilitarianism is that it seems unfair to say that the rescuer acted wrongly because the rescuer could not foresee the future bad effects of saving the drowning person. In response, actual consequence utilitarians reply that there is a difference between evaluating an action and evaluating the person who did the action. In their view, while the rescuer’s action was wrong, it would be a mistake to blame or criticize the rescuer because the bad results of his act were unforeseeable. They stress the difference between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who perform them.

Foreseeable consequence utilitarians accept the distinction between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who carry them out, but they see no reason to make the moral rightness or wrongness of actions depend on facts that might be unknowable. For them, what is right or wrong for a person to do depends on what is knowable by a person at a time. For this reason, they claim that the person who rescued Hitler did the right thing, even though the actual consequences were unfortunate.

Another way to describe the actual vs. foreseeable consequence dispute is to contrast two thoughts. One (the actual consequence view) says that to act rightly is to do whatever produces the best consequences. The second view says that a person acts rightly by doing the action that has the highest level of “expected utility.” The expected utility is a combination of the good (or bad) effects that one predicts will result from an action and the probability of those effects occurring. In the case of the rescuer, the expected positive utility is high because the probability that saving a drowning person will lead to the deaths of millions of other people is extremely low, and thus can be ignored in deliberations about whether to save the drowning person.

What this shows is that actual consequence and foreseeable consequence utilitarians have different views about the nature of utilitarian theory. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians understand the theory as a decision-making procedure while actual consequence utilitarians understand it as a criterion of right and wrong. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians claim that the action with the highest expected utility is both the best thing to do based on current evidence and the right action. Actual consequence utilitarians might agree that the option with the highest expected utility is the best thing to do but they claim that it could still turn out to be the wrong action. This would occur if unforeseen bad consequences reveal that the option chosen did not have the best results and thus was the wrong thing to do.

2. How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ

Both act utilitarians and rule utilitarians agree that our overall aim in evaluating actions should be to create the best results possible, but they differ about how to do that.

Act utilitarians believe that whenever we are deciding what to do, we should perform the action that will create the greatest net utility. In their view, the principle of utility—do whatever will produce the best overall results—should be applied on a case by case basis. The right action in any situation is the one that yields more utility (i.e. creates more well-being) than other available actions.

Rule utilitarians adopt a two part view that stresses the importance of moral rules. According to rule utilitarians, a) a specific action is morally justified if it conforms to a justified moral rule; and b) a moral rule is justified if its inclusion into our moral code would create more utility than other possible rules (or no rule at all). According to this perspective, we should judge the morality of individual actions by reference to general moral rules, and we should judge particular moral rules by seeing whether their acceptance into our moral code would produce more well-being than other possible rules.

The key difference between act and rule utilitarianism is that act utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of individual actions while rule utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of rules and then evaluate individual actions by seeing if they obey or disobey those rules whose acceptance will produce the most utility.

The contrast between act and rule utilitarianism, though previously noted by some philosophers, was not sharply drawn until the late 1950s when Richard Brandt introduced this terminology. (Other terms that have been used to make this contrast are “direct” and “extreme” for act utilitarianism, and “indirect” and “restricted” for rule utilitarianism.) Because the contrast had not been sharply drawn, earlier utilitarians like Bentham and Mill sometimes apply the principle of utility to actions and sometimes apply it to the choice of rules for evaluating actions. This has led to scholarly debates about whether the classical utilitarians supported act utilitarians or rule utilitarians or some combination of these views. One indication that Mill accepted rule utilitarianism is his claim that direct appeal to the principle of utility is made only when “secondary principles” (i.e. rules) conflict with one another. In such cases, the “maximize utility” principle is used to resolve the conflict and determine the right action to take. [Mill, Utilitarianism, Chapter 2]

3. Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons

Act utilitarianism is often seen as the most natural interpretation of the utilitarian ideal. If our aim is always to produce the best results, it seems plausible to think that in each case of deciding what is the right thing to do, we should consider the available options (i.e. what actions could be performed), predict their outcomes, and approve of the action that will produce the most good.

a. Arguments for Act Utilitarianism

i. Why Act utilitarianism Maximizes Utility

If every action that we carry out yields more utility than any other action available to us, then the total utility of all our actions will be the highest possible level of utility that we could bring about. In other words, we can maximize the overall utility that is within our power to bring about by maximizing the utility of each individual action that we perform. If we sometimes choose actions that produce less utility than is possible, the total utility of our actions will be less than the amount of goodness that we could have produced. For that reason, act utilitarians argue, we should apply the utilitarian principle to individual acts and not to classes of similar actions.

ii. Why Act Utilitarianism is Better than Traditional, Rule-based Moralities

Traditional moral codes often consist of sets of rules regarding types of actions. The Ten Commandments, for example, focus on types of actions, telling us not to kill, steal, bear false witness, commit adultery, or covet the things that belong to others. Although the Biblical sources permit exceptions to these rules (such as killing in self-defense and punishing people for their sins), the form of the commandments is absolute. They tell us “thou shalt not do x” rather than saying “thou shalt not do x except in circumstances a, b, or c.”

In fact, both customary and philosophical moral codes often seem to consist of absolute rules. The philosopher Immanuel Kant is famous for the view that lying is always wrong, even in cases where one might save a life by lying. According to Kant, if A is trying to murder B and A asks you where B is, it would be wrong for you to lie to A, even if lying would save B’s life (Kant).

Act utilitarians reject rigid rule-based moralities that identify whole classes of actions as right or wrong. They argue that it is a mistake to treat whole classes of actions as right or wrong because the effects of actions differ when they are done in different contexts and morality must focus on the likely effects of individual actions. It is these effects that determine whether they are right or wrong in specific cases. Act utilitarians acknowledge that it may be useful to have moral rules that are “rules of thumb”—i.e., rules that describe what is generally right or wrong, but they insist that whenever people can do more good by violating a rule rather than obeying it, they should violate the rule. They see no reason to obey a rule when more well-being can be achieved by violating it.

iii. Why Act Utilitarianism Makes Moral Judgments Objectively True

One advantage of act utilitarianism is that it shows how moral questions can have objectively true answers. Often, people believe that morality is subjective and depends only on people’s desires or sincere beliefs. Act utilitarianism, however, provides a method for showing which moral beliefs are true and which are false.

Once we embrace the act utilitarian perspective, then every decision about how we should act will depend on the actual or foreseeable consequences of the available options. If we can predict the amount of utility/good results that will be produced by various possible actions, then we can know which ones are right or wrong.

Although some people doubt that we can measure amounts of well-being, we in fact do this all the time. If two people are suffering and we have enough medication for only one, we can often tell that one person is experiencing mild discomfort while the other is in severe pain. Based on this judgment, we will be confident that we can do more good by giving the medication to the person suffering extreme pain. Although this case is very simple, it shows that we can have objectively true answers to questions about what actions are morally right or wrong.

Jeremy Bentham provided a model for this type of decision making in his description of a “hedonic calculus,” which was meant to show what factors should be used to determine amounts of pleasure and happiness, pain and suffering. Using this information, Bentham thought, would allow for making correct judgments both in individual cases and in choices about government actions and policies.

b. Arguments against Act Utilitarianism

i. The “Wrong Answers” Objection

The most common argument against act utilitarianism is that it gives the wrong answers to moral questions. Critics say that it permits various actions that everyone knows are morally wrong. The following cases are among the commonly cited examples:

If a judge can prevent riots that will cause many deaths only by convicting an innocent person of a crime and imposing a severe punishment on that person, act utilitarianism implies that the judge should convict and punish the innocent person. (See Rawls and also Punishment.)
If a doctor can save five people from death by killing one healthy person and using that person’s organs for life-saving transplants, then act utilitarianism implies that the doctor should kill the one person to save five.
If a person makes a promise but breaking the promise will allow that person to perform an action that creates just slightly more well-being than keeping the promise will, then act utilitarianism implies that the promise should be broken. (See Ross)

The general form of each of these arguments is the same. In each case, act utilitarianism implies that a certain act is morally permissible or required. Yet, each of the judgments that flow from act utilitarianism conflicts with widespread, deeply held moral beliefs. Because act utilitarianism approves of actions that most people see as obviously morally wrong, we can know that it is a false moral theory.

ii. The “Undermining Trust” Objection

Although act utilitarians criticize traditional moral rules for being too rigid, critics charge that utilitarians ignore the fact that this alleged rigidity is the basis for trust between people. If, in cases like the ones described above, judges, doctors, and promise-makers are committed to doing whatever maximizes well-being, then no one will be able to trust that judges will act according to the law, that doctors will not use the organs of one patient to benefit others, and that promise-makers will keep their promises. More generally, if everyone believed that morality permitted lying, promise-breaking, cheating, and violating the law whenever doing so led to good results, then no one could trust other people to obey these rules. As a result, in an act utilitarian society, we could not believe what others say, could not rely on them to keep promises, and in general could not count on people to act in accord with important moral rules. As a result, people’s behavior would lack the kind of predictability and consistency that are required to sustain trust and social stability.

iii. Partiality and the “Too Demanding” Objection

Critics also attack utilitarianism’s commitment to impartiality and the equal consideration of interests. An implication of this commitment is that whenever people want to buy something for themselves or for a friend or family member, they must first determine whether they could create more well-being by donating their money to help unknown strangers who are seriously ill or impoverished. If more good can be done by helping strangers than by purchasing things for oneself or people one personally cares about, then act utilitarianism requires us to use the money to help strangers in need. Why? Because act utilitarianism requires impartiality and the equal consideration of all people’s needs and interests.

Almost everyone, however, believes that we have special moral duties to people who are near and dear to us. As a result, most people would reject the notion that morality requires us to treat people we love and care about no differently from people who are perfect strangers as absurd.

This issue is not merely a hypothetical case. In a famous article, Peter Singer defends the view that people living in affluent countries should not purchase luxury items for themselves when the world is full of impoverished people. According to Singer, a person should keep donating money to people in dire need until the donor reaches the point where giving to others generates more harm to the donor than the good that is generated for the recipients.

Critics claim that the argument for using our money to help impoverished strangers rather than benefiting ourselves and people we care about only proves one thing—that act utilitarianism is false. There are two reasons that show why it is false. First, it fails to recognize the moral legitimacy of giving special preferences to ourselves and people that we know and care about. Second, since pretty much everyone is strongly motivated to act on behalf of themselves and people they care about, a morality that forbids this and requires equal consideration of strangers is much too demanding. It asks more than can reasonably be expected of people.

c. Possible Responses to Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism

There are two ways in which act utilitarians can defend their view against these criticisms. First, they can argue that critics misinterpret act utilitarianism and mistakenly claim that it is committed to supporting the wrong answer to various moral questions. This reply agrees that the “wrong answers” are genuinely wrong, but it denies that the “wrong answers” maximize utility. Because they do not maximize utility, these wrong answers would not be supported by act utilitarians and therefore, do nothing to weaken their theory.

Second, act utilitarians can take a different approach by agreeing with the critics that act utilitarianism supports the views that critics label “wrong answers.” Act utilitarians may reply that all this shows is that the views supported by act utilitarianism conflict with common sense morality. Unless critics can prove that common sense moral beliefs are correct the criticisms have no force. Act utilitarians claim that their theory provides good reasons to reject many ordinary moral claims and to replace them with moral views that are based on the effects of actions.

People who are convinced by the criticisms of act utilitarianism may decide to reject utilitarianism entirely and adopt a different type of moral theory. This judgment, however, would be sound only if act utilitarianism were the only type of utilitarian theory. If there are other versions of utilitarianism that do not have act utilitarianism’s flaws, then one may accept the criticisms of act utilitarianism without forsaking utilitarianism entirely. This is what defenders of rule utilitarianism claim. They argue that rule utilitarianism retains the virtues of a utilitarian moral theory but without the flaws of the act utilitarian version.

4. Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons

Unlike act utilitarians, who try to maximize overall utility by applying the utilitarian principle to individual acts, rule utilitarians believe that we can maximize utility only by setting up a moral code that contains rules. The correct moral rules are those whose inclusion in our moral code will produce better results (more well-being) than other possible rules. Once we determine what these rules are, we can then judge individual actions by seeing if they conform to these rules. The principle of utility, then, is used to evaluate rules and is not applied directly to individual actions. Once the rules are determined, compliance with these rules provides the standard for evaluating individual actions.

a. Arguments for Rule Utilitarianism

i. Why Rule Utilitarianism Maximizes Utility

Rule utilitarianism sounds paradoxical. It says that we can produce more beneficial results by following rules than by always performing individual actions whose results are as beneficial as possible. This suggests that we should not always perform individual actions that maximize utility. How could this be something that a utilitarian would support?

In spite of this paradox, rule utilitarianism possesses its own appeal, and its focus on moral rules can sound quite plausible. The rule utilitarian approach to morality can be illustrated by considering the rules of the road. If we are devising a code for drivers, we can adopt either open-ended rules like “drive safely” or specific rules like “stop at red lights,” “do not travel more than 30 miles per hour in residential areas,” “do not drive when drunk,” etc. The rule “drive safely”, like the act utilitarian principle, is a very general rule that leaves it up to individuals to determine what the best way to drive in each circumstance is. More specific rules that require stopping at lights, forbid going faster than 30 miles per hour, or prohibit driving while drunk do not give drivers the discretion to judge what is best to do. They simply tell drivers what to do or not do while driving.

The reason why a more rigid rule-based system leads to greater overall utility is that people are notoriously bad at judging what is the best thing to do when they are driving a car. Having specific rules maximizes utility by limiting drivers’ discretionary judgments and thereby decreasing the ways in which drivers may endanger themselves and others.

A rule utilitarian can illustrate this by considering the difference between stop signs and yield signs. Stop signs forbid drivers to go through an intersection without stopping, even if the driver sees that there are no cars approaching and thus no danger in not stopping. A yield sign permits drivers to go through without stopping unless they judge that approaching cars make it dangerous to drive through the intersection. The key difference between these signs is the amount of discretion that they give to the driver.

The stop sign is like the rule utilitarian approach. It tells drivers to stop and does not allow them to calculate whether it would be better to stop or not. The yield sign is like act utilitarianism. It permits drivers to decide whether there is a need to stop. Act utilitarians see the stop sign as too rigid because it requires drivers to stop even when nothing bad will be prevented. The result, they say, is a loss of utility each time a driver stops at a stop sign when there is no danger from oncoming cars.

Rule utilitarians will reply that they would reject the stop sign method a) if people could be counted on to drive carefully and b) if traffic accidents only caused limited amounts of harm. But, they say, neither of these is true. Because people often drive too fast and are inattentive while driving (because they are, for example, talking, texting, listening to music, or tired), we cannot count on people to make good utilitarian judgments about how to drive safely. In addition, the costs (i.e. the disutility) of accidents can be very high. Accident victims (including drivers) may be killed, injured, or disabled for life. For these reasons, rule utilitarians support the use of stop signs and other non-discretionary rules under some circumstances. Overall these rules generate greater utility because they prevent more disutility (from accidents) than they create (from “unnecessary” stops).

Rule utilitarians generalize from this type of case and claim that our knowledge of human behavior shows that there are many cases in which general rules or practices are more likely to promote good effects than simply telling people to do whatever they think is best in each individual case.

This does not mean that rule utilitarians always support rigid rules without exceptions. Some rules can identify types of situations in which the prohibition is over-ridden. In emergency medical situations, for example, a driver may justifiably go through a red light or stop sign based on the driver’s own assessment that a) this can be done safely and b) the situation is one in which even a short delay might cause dire harms. So the correct rule need not be “never go through a stop sign” but rather can be something like “never go through a stop sign except in cases that have properties a and b.” In addition, there will remain many things about driving or other behavior that can be left to people’s discretion. The rules of the road do not tell drivers when to drive or what their destination should be for example.

Overall then, rule utilitarian can allow departures from rules and will leave many choices up to individuals. In such cases, people may act in the manner that looks like the approach supported by act utilitarians. Nonetheless, these discretionary actions are permitted because having a rule in these cases does not maximize utility or because the best rule may impose some constraints on how people act while still permitting a lot of discretion in deciding what to do.

ii. Rule Utilitarianism Avoids the Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism

As discussed earlier, critics of act utilitarianism raise three strong objections against it. According to these critics, act utilitarianism a) approves of actions that are clearly wrong; b) undermines trust among people, and c) is too demanding because it requires people to make excessive levels of sacrifice. Rule utilitarians tend to agree with these criticisms of act utilitarianism and try to explain why rule utilitarianism is not open to any of these objections.

1. Judges, Doctors, and Promise-makers

Critics of act utilitarianism claim that it allows judges to sentence innocent people to severe punishments when doing so will maximize utility, allows doctors to kill healthy patients if by doing so, they can use the organs of one person to save more lives, and allows people to break promises if that will create slightly more benefits than keeping the promise.

Rule utilitarians say that they can avoid all these charges because they do not evaluate individual actions separately but instead support rules whose acceptance maximizes utility. To see the difference that their focus on rules makes, consider which rule would maximize utility: a) a rule that allows medical doctors to kill healthy patients so that they can use their organs for transplants that will save a larger number of patients who would die without these organs; or b) a rule that forbids doctors to remove the organs of healthy patients in order to benefit other patients.

Although more good may be done by killing the healthy patient in an individual case, it is unlikely that more overall good will be done by having a rule that allows this practice. If a rule were adopted that allows doctors to kill healthy patients when this will save more lives, the result would be that many people would not go to doctors at all. A rule utilitarian evaluation will take account of the fact that the benefits of medical treatment would be greatly diminished because people would no longer trust doctors. People who seek medical treatment must have a high degree of trust in doctors. If they had to worry that doctors might use their organs to help other patients, they would not, for example, allow doctors to anesthetize them for surgery because the resulting loss of consciousness would make them completely vulnerable and unable to defend themselves. Thus, the rule that allows doctors to kill one patient to save five would not maximize utility.

The same reasoning applies equally to the case of the judge. In order to have a criminal justice system that protects people from being harmed by others, we authorize judges and other officials to impose serious punishments on people who are convicted of crimes. The purpose of this is to provide overall security to people in their jurisdiction, but this requires that criminal justice officials only have the authority to impose arrest and imprisonment on people who are actually believed to be guilty. They do not have the authority to do whatever they think will lead to the best results in particular cases. Whatever they do must be constrained by rules that limit their power. Act utilitarians may sometimes support the intentional punishment of innocent people, but rule utilitarians will understand the risks involved and will oppose a practice that allows it.

Rule utilitarians offer a similar analysis of the promise keeping case. They explain that in general, we want people to keep their promises even in some cases in which doing so may lead to less utility than breaking the promise. The reason for this is that the practice of promise-keeping is a very valuable. It enables people to have a wide range of cooperative relationships by generating confidence that other people will do what they promise to do. If we knew that people would fail to keep promises whenever some option arises that leads to more utility, then we could not trust people who make promises to us to carry them through. We would always have to worry that some better option (one that act utilitarians would favor) might emerge, leading to the breaking of the person’s promise to us.

In each of these cases then, rule utilitarians can agree with the critics of act utilitarianism that it is wrong for doctors, judges, and promise-makers to do case by case evaluations of whether they should harm their patients, convict and punish innocent people, and break promises. The rule utilitarian approach stresses the value of general rules and practices, and shows why compliance with rules often maximizes overall utility even if in some individual cases, it requires doing what produces less utility.

2. Maintaining vs. Undermining Trust

Rule utilitarians see the social impact of a rule-based morality as one of the key virtues of their theory. The three cases just discussed show why act utilitarianism undermines trust but rule utilitarianism does not. Fundamentally, in the cases of doctors, judges, and promise-keepers, it is trust that is at stake. Being able to trust other people is extremely important to our well-being. Part of trusting people involves being able to predict what they will and won’t do. Because act utilitarians are committed to a case by case evaluation method, the adoption of their view would make people’s actions much less predictable. As a result, people would be less likely to see other people as reliable and trustworthy. Rule utilitarianism does not have this problem because it is committed to rules, and these rules generate positive “expectation effects” that give us a basis for knowing how other people are likely to behave.

While rule utilitarians do not deny that there are people who are not trustworthy, they can claim that their moral code generally condemns violations of trust as wrongful acts. The problem with act utilitarians is that they support a moral view that has the effect of undermining trust and that sacrifices the good effects of a moral code that supports and encourages trustworthiness.

3. Impartiality and the Problem of Over-Demandingness

Rule utilitarians believe that their view is also immune to the criticism that act utilitarianism is too demanding. In addition, while the act utilitarian commitment to impartiality undermines the moral relevance of personal relations, rule utilitarians claim that their view is not open to this criticism. They claim that rule utilitarianism allows for partiality toward ourselves and others with whom we share personal relationships. Moreover, they say, rule utilitarianism can recognize justifiable partiality to some people without rejecting the commitment to impartiality that is central to the utilitarian tradition.

How can rule utilitarianism do this? How can it be an impartial moral theory while also allowing partiality in people’s treatment of their friends, family, and others with whom they have a special connection?

In his defense of rule utilitarianism, Brad Hooker distinguishes two different contexts in which partiality and impartiality play a role. One involves the justification of moral rules and the other concerns the application of moral rules. Justifications of moral rules, he claims, must be strictly impartial. When we ask whether a rule should be adopted, it is essential to consider the impact of the rule on all people and to weigh the interests of everyone equally.

The second context concerns the content of the rules and how they are applied in actual cases. Rule utilitarians argue that a rule utilitarian moral code will allow partiality to play a role in determining what morality requires, forbids, or allows us to do. As an example, consider a moral rule parents have a special duty to care for their own children. (See Parental Rights and Obligations.) This is a partialist rule because it not only allows but actually requires parents to devote more time, energy, and other resources to their own children than to others. While it does not forbid devoting resources to other people’s children, it allows people to give to their own. While the content of this rule is not impartial, rule utilitarians believe it can be impartially justified. Partiality toward children can be justified for several reasons. Caring for children is a demanding activity. Children need the special attention of adults to develop physically, emotionally, and cognitively. Because children’s needs vary, knowledge of particular children’s needs is necessary to benefit them. For these reasons, it is plausible to believe that children’s well-being can best be promoted by a division of labor that requires particular parents (or other caretakers) to focus primarily on caring for specific children rather than trying to take care of all children. It is not possible for absentee parents or strangers to provide individual children with all that they need. Therefore, we can maximize the overall well-being of children as a class by designating certain people as the caretakers for specific children. For these reasons, partiality toward specific children can be impartially justified.

Similar “division of labor” arguments can be used to provide impartial justifications of other partialist rules and practices. Teachers, for example have special duties to students in their own classes and have no duty to educate all students. Similarly, public officials can and should be partial to people in the jurisdiction in which they work. If the overall aim is to maximize the well-being of all people in all cities, for example, then we are likely to get better results by having individuals who know and understand particular cities focus on them while other people focus on other cities.

Based on examples like these, rule utilitarians claim that their view, unlike act utilitarianism, avoids the problems raised about demandingness and partiality. Being committed to impartialist justifications of moral rules does not commit them to rejecting moral rules that allow or require people to give specific others priority.

While rule utilitarians can defend partiality, their commitment to maximizing overall utility also allows them to justify limits on the degree of partiality that is morally permissible. At a minimum, rule utilitarians will support a rule that forbids parents to harm other people’s children in order to advance the interests of their own children. (It would be wrong, for example, for a parent to injure children who are running in a school race in order to increase the chances that their own children will win.) Moreover, though this is more controversial, rule utilitarians may support a rule that says that if parents are financially well-off and if their own children’s needs are fully met, these parents may have a moral duty to contribute some resources for children who are deprived of essential resources.

The key point is that while rule utilitarianism permits partiality toward some people, it can also generate rules that limit the ways in which people may act partially and it might even support a positive duty for well off people to provide assistance to strangers when the needs and interests of people to whom we are partial are fully met, when they have surplus resources that could be used to assist strangers in dire conditions, and when there are ways to channel these resources effectively to people in dire need.

b. Arguments against Rule Utilitarianism

i. The “Rule Worship” Objection

Act utilitarians criticize rule utilitarians for irrationally supporting rule-based actions in cases where more good could be done by violating the rule than obeying it. They see this as a form of “rule worship,” an irrational deference to rules that has no utilitarian justification (J. J. C. Smart).

Act utilitarians say that they recognize that rules can have value. For example, rules can provide a basis for acting when there is no time to deliberate. In addition, rules can define a default position, a justification for doing (or refraining from) a type of action as long as there is no reason for not doing it. But when people know that more good can be done by violating the rule then the default position should be over-ridden.

ii. The “Collapses into Act Utilitarianism” Objection

While the “rule worship” objection assumes that rule utilitarianism is different from act utilitarianism, some critics deny that this is the case. In their view, whatever defects act utilitarianism may have, rule utilitarianism will have the same defects. According to this criticism, although rule utilitarianism looks different from act utilitarianism, a careful examination shows that it collapses into or, as David Lyons claimed, is extensionally equivalent to act utilitarianism.

To understand this criticism, it is worth focusing on a distinction between rule utilitarianism and other non-utilitarian theories. Consider Kant’s claim that lying is always morally wrong, even when lying would save a person’s life. Many people see this view as too rigid and claim that it fails to take into account the circumstances in which a lie is being told. A more plausible rule would say “do not lie except in special circumstances that justify lying.” But what are these special circumstances? For a utilitarian, it is natural to say that the correct rule is “do not lie except when lying will generate more good than telling the truth.”

Suppose that a rule utilitarian adopts this approach and advocates a moral code that consists of a list of rules of this form. The rules would say something like “do x except when not doing x maximizes utility” and “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” While this may sound plausible, it is easy to see that this version of rule utilitarianism is in fact identical with act utilitarianism. Whatever action x is, the moral requirement and the moral prohibition expressed in these rules collapses into the act utilitarian rules “do x only when not doing x maximizes utility” or “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” These rules say exactly the same thing as the open-ended act utilitarian rule “Do whatever action maximizes utility.”

If rule utilitarianism is to be distinct from act utilitarianism, its supporters must find a way to formulate rules that allow exceptions to a general requirement or prohibition while not collapsing into act utilitarianism. One way to do this is to identify specific conditions under which violating a general moral requirement would be justified. Instead of saying that we can violate a general rule whenever doing so will maximize utility, the rule utilitarian code might say things like “Do not lie except to prevent severe harms to people who are not unjustifiably threatening others with severe harm.” This type of rule would prohibit lying generally, but it would permit lying to a murderer to prevent harm to the intended victims even if the lie would lead to harm to the murderer. In cases of lesser harms or deceitful acts that will benefit the liar, lying would still be prohibited, even if lying might maximize overall utility.

Rule utilitarians claim that this sort of rule is not open to the “collapses into act utilitarianism” objection. It also suggests, however, that rule utilitarians face difficult challenges in formulating utility-based rules that have a reasonable degree of flexibility built into them but are not so flexible that they collapse into act utilitarianism. In addition, although the rules that make up a moral code should be flexible enough to account for the complexities of life, they cannot be so complex that they are too difficult for people to learn and understand.

iii. Wrong Answers and Crude Concepts

Although rule utilitarians try to avoid the weaknesses attributed to act utilitarianism, critics argue that they cannot avoid these weaknesses because they do not take seriously many of our central moral concepts. As a result, they cannot support the right answers to crucial moral problems. Three prominent concepts in moral thought that critics cite are justice, rights, and desert. These moral ideas are often invoked in reasoning about morality, but critics claim that neither rule nor act utilitarianism acknowledge their importance. Instead, they focus only on the amounts of utility that actions or rules generate.

In considering the case, for example, of punishing innocent people, the best that rule utilitarians can do is to say that a rule that permits this would lead to worse results overall than a rule that permitted it. This prediction, however, is precarious. While it may be true, it may also be false, and if it is false, then utilitarians must acknowledge that intentionally punishing an innocent person could sometimes be morally justified.

Against this, critics may appeal to common sense morality to support the view that there are no circumstances in which punishing the innocent can be justified because the innocent person is a) being treated unjustly, b) has a right not to be punished for something that he or she is not guilty of, and c) does not deserve to be punished for a crime that he or she did not commit.

In responding, rule utilitarians may begin, first, with the view that they do not reject concepts like justice, rights, and desert. Instead, they accept and use these concepts but interpret them from the perspective of maximizing utility. To speak of justice, rights, and desert is to speak of rules of individual treatment that are very important, and what makes them important is their contribution to promoting overall well-being. Moreover, even people who accept these concepts as basic still need to determine whether it is always wrong to treat someone unjustly, violate their rights, or treat them in ways that they don’t deserve.

Critics object to utilitarianism by claiming that the theory justifies treating people unjustly, violating their rights, etc. This criticism only stands up if it is always wrong and thus never morally justified to treat people in these ways. Utilitarians argue that moral common sense is less absolutist than their critics acknowledge. In the case of punishment, for example, while we hope that our system of criminal justice gives people fair trials and conscientiously attempts to separate the innocent from the guilty, we know that the system is not perfect. As a result, people who are innocent are sometimes prosecuted, convicted, and punished for crimes they did not do.

This is the problem of wrongful convictions, which poses a difficult challenge to critics of utilitarianism. If we know that our system of criminal justice punishes some people unjustly and in ways they don’t deserve, we are faced with a dilemma. Either we can shut down the system and punish no one, or we can maintain the system even though we know that it will result in some innocent people being unjustly punished in ways that they do not deserve. Most people will support continuing to punish people in spite of the fact that it involves punishing some people unjustly. According to rule utilitarians, this can only be justified if a rule that permits punishments (after a fair trial, etc.) yields more overall utility than a rule that rejects punishment because it treats some people unfairly. To end the practice of punishment entirely—because it inevitably causes some injustice—is likely to result in worse consequences because it deprives society of a central means of protecting people’s well-being, including what are regarded as their rights. In the end, utilitarians say, it is justice and rights that give way when rules that approve of violations in some cases yield the greatest amount of utility.

5. Conclusion

The debate between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism highlights many important issues about how we should make moral judgments. Act utilitarianism stresses the specific context and the many individual features of the situations that pose moral problems, and it presents a single method for dealing with these individual cases. Rule utilitarianism stresses the recurrent features of human life and the ways in which similar needs and problems arise over and over again. From this perspective, we need rules that deal with types or classes of actions: killing, stealing, lying, cheating, taking care of our friends or family, punishing people for crimes, aiding people in need, etc. Both of these perspectives, however, agree that the main determinant of what is right or wrong is the relationship between what we do or what form our moral code takes and what is the impact of our moral perspective on the level of people’s well-being.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Classic Works

Jeremy Bentham. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, available in many editions, 1789.
- See Book I, chapter 1 for Bentham’s statement of what utilitarianism is; chapter IV for his method of measuring amounts of pleasure/utility; chapter V for his list of types of pleasures and pains, and chapter XIII for his application of utilitarianism to questions about criminal punishment.
John Stuart Mill. Utilitarianism, available in many editions and online, 1861.
- See especially chapter II, in which Mill tries both to clarify and defend utilitarianism. Passages at the end of chapter suggest that Mill was a rule utilitarian. In chapter V, Mill tries to show that utilitarianism is compatible with justice.
Henry Sidgwick. The Methods of Ethics, Seventh Edition, available in many editions, 1907.
- Sidgwick is known for his careful, extended analysis of utilitarian moral theory and competing views.
G. E. Moore. Principia Ethica, 1903.
- Moore criticizes aspects of Mill’s views but support a non-hedonistic form of utilitarianism.
G. E. Moore. Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1912.
- Mostly focused on utilitarianism, this book contains a combination of act and rule utilitarian ideas.

b. More Recent Utilitarians

J. J. C. Smart. “An Outline of a System of Utilitarian Ethics” in J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Smart’s discussion combines an overview of moral theory and a defense of act utilitarianism. It is followed by Bernard Williams’, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” a source of many important criticisms of utilitarianism.
Richard Brandt. Ethical Theory. Prentice Hall, 1959. Chapter 15.
- Brandt, who coined the terms “act” and “rule” utilitarianism, explains and criticizes act utilitarianism and tentatively proposes a version of rule utilitarianism.
Richard Brandt. Morality, Utilitarianism, and Rights. Cambridge University Press, 1992.
- Brandt developed and defended rule utilitarianism in many papers. This book contains several of them as well as works in which he applies rule utilitarian thinking to issues like rights and the ethics of war.
R. M. Hare. Moral Thinking. Oxford University Press, 1981.
- An interesting development of a form of rule utilitarianism by an influential moral theorist.
John C. Harsanyi. “Morality and the Theory of Rational Behavior.” in Social Research 44.4 (1977): 623-656. (Reprinted in Amartya Sen and Bernard Williams, eds., Utilitarianism and Beyond, Cambridge University Press, 1982).
- Harsanyi, a Nobel Prize economist, defends rule utilitarianism, connecting it to a preference theory of value and a theory of rational action.
John Rawls. “Two Concepts of Rules.” In Philosophical Review LXIV (1955), 3-32.
- Before becoming an influential critic of utilitarianism, Rawls wrote this defense of rule utilitarianism.
Brad Hooker. Ideal Code, Real World: A Rule-consequentialist Theory of Morality. Oxford University Press, 2000.
- In this 21^st century defense of rule utilitarianism, Hooker places it in the context of more recent developments in philosophy.
Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. HarperCollins, 2000.
- Singer, a prolific, widely read thinker, mostly applies a utilitarian perspective to controversial moral issues (for example, euthanasia, the treatment of non-human animals, and global poverty) rather than discussing utilitarian moral theory. This volume contains selections from his books and articles.
Peter Singer. “Famine, Affluence, and Morality” in Philosophy and Public Affairs 1 (1972), 229-43. Reprinted in Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. Harper Collins, 2000.
- This widely reprinted article, though it does not focus on utilitarianism, uses utilitarian reasoning and has sparked decades of debate about moral demandingness and moral impartiality.
Robert Goodin. Utilitarianism as a Public Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- In a series of essays, Goodin argues that utilitarianism is the best philosophy for public decision-making even if it fails as an ethic for personal aspects of life.
Derek Parfit. On What Matters. Oxford University Press, 1991.
- In a long, complex work, Parfit stresses the importance of Henry Sidgwick as a moral philosopher and argues that rule utilitarianism and Kantian deontology can be understood in a way that makes them compatible with one another.

c. Overviews

Tim Mulgan. Understanding Utilitarianism. Acumen, 2007.
- This is a very clear description of utilitarianism, including explanations of arguments both for and against. Chapter 2 discusses Bentham, Mill, and Sidgwick while chapter 6 focuses on act and rule utilitarianism.
Julia Driver, “The History of Utilitarianism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This article gives a good historical account of important figures in the development of utilitarianism.
Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, “Consequentialism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This very useful overview is relevant to utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
William Shaw. Contemporary Ethics: Taking Account of Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 1999.
- Shaw provides a clear, comprehensive discussion of utilitarianism and its critics as well as defending utilitarianism.
John Troyer. The Classical Utilitarians: Bentham and Mill. Hackett, 2003.
- Troyer’s introduction to this book of selections from Mill and Bentham is clear and informative.
Ben Eggleston and Dale Miller, eds. The Cambridge Companion to Utilitarianism. Cambridge University Press, 2014.
- This collection contains sixteen essays on utilitarianism, including essays on historical figures as well as discussion of 21^st century issues, including both act and rule utilitarianism.

d. J. S. Mill and Utilitarian Moral Theory

J. O. Urmson. “The Interpretation of the Moral Philosophy of J. S. Mill,” in Philosophical Quarterly (1953) 3, 33-9.
- This article generated renewed interest in both Mill’s moral theory and rule utilitarianism.
Roger Crisp. Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Mill on Utilitarianism. Routledge, 1997.
A clear discussion of Mill’s Utilitarianism with chapters on key topics as well as on Mill’s On Liberty and The Subjection of Women.
Henry. R. West, ed. The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 2006.
- This contains the complete text of Mill’s Utilitarianism preceded by three essays on the background to Mill’s utilitarianism and followed by five interpretative essays and four focusing on contemporary issues.
Henry R. West. An Introduction to Mill’s Utilitarian Ethics. Cambridge University Press, 2004.
- A clear discussion of Mill; Chapter 4 argues that Mill is neither an act nor a rule utilitarian. Chapter 6 focuses on utilitarianism and justice.
Dale Miller. J. S. Mill. Polity Press, 2010.
- Miller, in Chapter 6, argues that Mill was a rule utilitarian.
Stephen Nathanson. “John Stuart Mill on Economic Justice and the Alleviation of Poverty,” in Journal of Social Philosophy, XLIII, no. 2.
- Drawing on Mill’s Principles of Political Economy, Nathanson claims that Mill was a rule utilitarian and provides an interpretation of Mill’s views on economic justice.
Wendy Donner, “Mill’s Utilitarianism” in John Skorupski, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Mill. Cambridge University Press, 1998, 255–92.
- A discussion of Mill’s views and some recent interpretations of them.
David Lyons. Rights, Welfare, and Mill’s Moral Theory. Oxford, 1994.
- In this series of papers, Lyons defends Mill’s view of morality against some critics, differentiates Mill’s views from both act and rule utilitarianism, and criticizes Mill’s attempt to show that utilitarianism can account for justice.

e. Critics of Utilitarianism

David Lyons. Forms and Limits of Utilitarianism. Oxford, 1965.
- Lyons argues that at least some versions of rule utilitarianism collapse into act utilitarianism.
David Lyons. “The Moral Opacity of Utilitarianism” in Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- In a challenging essay, Lyons raises doubts about whether there is any coherent version of utilitarianism.
Judith Jarvis Thomson. “The Trolley Problem.” Yale Law Journal 94 (1985), 1395-1415. Reprinted in Judith Jarvis Thomson. Rights, Restitution and Risk. Edited by William Parent. Harvard University Press, 1986; Chapter 7.
- An influential rights-based discussion in which Jarvis Thomson uses hypothetical cases to show, among other things, that utilitarianism cannot explain why some actions that cause killings are permissible and others not.
Bernard Williams, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” In J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Williams’ contribution to this debate contains arguments and examples that have played an important role in debates about utilitarianism and moral theory.

f. Collections of Essays

Michael D. Bayles, ed. Contemporary Utilitarianism. Garden City: Doubleday, 1968.
- Ten essays that debate act vs. rule utilitarianism as well as whether a form of utilitarianism is correct.
Samuel Gorovitz, ed. John Stuart Mill: Utilitarianism, With Critical Essays. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company, 1971.
- This includes Mill’s Utlitarianism plus a rich array of twenty-eight (pre-1970) articles interpreting, defending, and criticizing utilitarianism.
Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- Thirteen essays on utilitarianism, many focused on issues concerning rule utilitarianism.
Samuel Scheffler. Consequentialism and Its Critics. Oxford, 1988.
- This contains a dozen influential articles, mostly by prominent critics of utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
Amartya Sen, and Bernard Williams, eds. Utilitarianism and Beyond. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
- This contains fourteen articles, including essays defending utilitarianism by R. M. Hare and John Harsanyi, As the title suggests, however, most of the articles are critical of utilitarianism.

Author Information

Stephen Nathanson
Email: s.nathanson@neu.edu
Northeastern University
U. S. A.

The Meaning of Life: Early Continental and Analytic Perspectives

The question of the meaning of life is one that interests philosophers and non-philosophers alike. The question itself is notoriously ambiguous and possibly vague. In asking about the meaning of life, one may be asking about the essence of life, about life’s purpose, about whether and how anything matters, or a host of other things.

Not everyone is plagued by questions about life’s meaning, but some are. The circumstances in which one does ask about life’s meaning include those in which: one is well off but bothered by either a sense of dissatisfaction or the prospect of bad things to come; one is young at heart and has a sense of wonder; one is perplexed by the discordant plurality of things and wants to find some unity in all the diversity; or one has lost faith in old values and narratives and wants to know how to live in order to have a meaningful life.

We may read our ancestors in such a way that warrants the claim that the meaning of life has been a human concern from the beginning. But it was only early in the nineteenth century that writers began to write directly about “the meaning of life.” The most significant writers were: Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy. Schopenhauer ended up saying that the meaning of life is to deny it; Kierkegaard, that the meaning of life is to obey God passionately; Nietzsche, that the meaning of life is the will to power; and Tolstoy, that the meaning of life lies in a kind of irrational knowledge called “faith.”

In the twentieth century, in the Continental tradition, Heidegger held that the meaning of life is to live authentically or (alternatively) to be a guardian of the earth. Sartre espoused the view that life is meaningless but urged us nonetheless to make a free choice that would give our lives meaning and responsibility. Camus also thought that life is absurd and meaningless. The best way to cope with this fact, he held, is to live life with passion, using everything up, and with an attitude of revolt, defiance, or scorn.

In the Anglo-American tradition, William James held that life is meaningful and worth living because of a spiritual order in which we should believe, or else that it is meaningful when there is a marriage of ideals with pluck, will, and the manly virtues; Bertrand Russell argued that to live a meaningful life one must abandon private and petty interests and instead cultivate an interest in the eternal; Moritz Schlick argued that the meaning of life is to be found in play; and A. J. Ayer asserted that the question of the meaning of life is itself meaningless.

All of these set the table for a veritable feast of philosophical writing on the meaning of life that began in the 1950s with Kurt Baier’s essay “The Meaning of Life,” followed in 1970 by Richard Taylor’s influential essay on the same topic, followed shortly by Thomas Nagel’s important 1971 essay on “The Absurd.” See “Meaning of Life: The Analytic Perspective” for more on the course of the debate in analytic philosophy about the meaning of life.

Background
Nineteenth Century Philosophers
Early Twentieth Century Continental Philosophers
1. Heidegger
2. Sartre
3. Camus
Early Twentieth Century Analytic, American, and English-Language Philosophers
1. James
2. Russell
3. Schlick
4. Tagore
5. Ayer
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Background

a. The Origin of the English Expression “the Meaning of Life”

The English term “meaning” dates back to the fourteenth century C.E. Its origins, according to the Oxford English Dictionary (OED), lie in the Middle English word “meenyng” (also spelled “menaynge,” “meneyng,” and “mennyng”).

In its earliest occurrences, in English original compositions as well as in English translations of earlier works, meaning is most often what, on the one hand, sentences, utterances, and stories, and, on the other hand, dreams, visions, signs, omens, and rituals have or might have. One asks about the meaning of some puzzling utterance, or of the writing on the wall, or of the vision that appeared to somebody in the night, or of the ritual performed on a hallowed occasion. Meaning is often conceived of as something non-obvious and somewhat secretive, discernible only by a seer granted with special powers.

It is much later that life is spoken of as something that might, or might not, have meaning in this sense. Such speech would have to wait upon the development of the concept of life as something like a word, a linguistic utterance, a narrative, a story, a gesture, a puzzling episode, a sign, a dream, a vision, or a surface phenomenon that points to some deep inner essence, to which it would be proper to inquire into its meaning, or to apply epithets like “meaningful” or “meaningless.” One of the earliest instances of the occurrence of the concept “life” as such a thing, as signifying something that might or might not have something like meaning, appears in Shakespeare’s Macbeth (c. 1605), where Macbeth characterizes life as “a tale told by an idiot, full of sound and fury, signifying nothing.” But notice that even here the words “meaning” and “life” are not linked.

The OED‘s definition of “meaning” in something like our sense is “The significance, purpose, underlying truth, etc., of something.” Further elaboration of early uses of the word gives us, “That which is indicated or expressed by a (supposed) symbol or symbolic action; spec. a message, warning, idea, etc., supposed to be symbolized by a dream, vision, omen, etc.” A bit later, in one of its senses, meaning takes on the sense in which it is the “signification; intention; cause, purpose; motive, justification,” . . . “[o]f an action, condition, etc.” Finally we get the sense that most nearly concerns us here: “Something which gives one a sense of purpose, value, etc., esp. of a metaphysical or spiritual kind; the (perceived) purpose of existence or of a person’s life. Freq. in the meaning of life.” (All this is from the OED.)

The first English use of the expression “the meaning of life” appeared in 1834 in Thomas Carlyle’s (1795-1881) Sartor Resartus II. ix, where Teufelsdrockh observes, “our Life is compassed round with Necessity; yet is the meaning of Life itself no other than Freedom.” The usage shortly caught on, and over the next century and a half the phrase “the meaning of life” became common. The adjective “meaningful” did not appear until 1852, the noun “meaningfulness” until 1904.

b. Questions about the Meaning of Life

The most familiar form of the question(s) about the meaning of life is simply, “What is the meaning of life?” Although the form of the question is one, when it is asked, any one (or more) of several different senses may be intended. Here are some of the more common of them.

(1) In some cases, what the seeker seeks is the kernel, the inner reality, the core, or the essence, underlying some phenomenon. Thus one might ask what his essence, his true self is, and then feel that he has found the meaning of his life if he discovers that true self.

(2) In other cases, the question is about the point, aim, object, purpose, end, or goal of life, typically one’s own. Here, in some cases, the question is about some pre-existing purpose that the questioner might (or might not) discover; in other cases, the question might be about some end or purpose the agent might invent or create and give her life. The latter questioner, when she is successful, may believe that her life has a meaning because she herself has given it one.

(3) In yet other cases, the question of the meaning of life is that of whether our lives, and anything we do within them, matter, or have any sort of importance. If one can show that they matter, and in virtue of what they do, one will have provided a substantive answer to the question of the meaning of life. A common, but not universal, assumption on this score is that our lives have significance and importance only if they issue in some lasting achievement the ravages of time will not destroy.

(4) In still other cases, what bothers the questioner is the discord, plurality, and chaotic nature of his apparent empirical life as it is actually lived. He can make no sense of it; there is no rhyme or reason to it. The drive here, one might well think, is to see one’s life as intelligible, as something that makes sense. The discovery or invention of some kind of unity in his life would amount to an answer to his question, “What is the meaning of life?”

(5) Yet another thing the question about the meaning of life can be is a request for a narrative or picture, a way of seeing life (perhaps a metaphorical one) that enables one to make sense of it and achieve a sense of meaning while living it. And so we get “Life is a bowl of cherries” and various and sundry religious narratives.

(6) Sometimes what the questioner is really wondering is whether it makes sense to go on and his question is “Is life worth living?” He may actually be contemplating suicide. His predicament has to do with meaning if he is assuming that it makes sense to continue living only if (his) life has a suitable meaning, something which, at the moment, he can’t see it as having.

(7) Finally, the question of the meaning of life can be the question of how one should live in order to have a meaningful life, or, if such a life is impossible, then what the best way to live meaninglessly is.

The seven questions just distinguished may be, but need not be, discrete and self-contained. A given seeker may very well be interested in several of them at once and see them as intimately connected. For example, a person may be interested in his core or essence because he thinks that knowledge of that may reveal the goal or purpose of his life, a purpose that makes his life seem important and intelligible, and gives him a reason for going on, as well as insight into how he must live in order to have a meaningful life. It is commonly the case that several of the questions press themselves on the seeker all at the same time.

One or more of these questions were of concern to the philosophers discussed below. Some were concerned with nearly all of them. Distinct from all the above are second-order, analytic, conceptual questions of the sort that dominate current philosophical discussion of the issue in analytic circles. These questions are not so much about the meaning of life as about the meaning of “the meaning of life” and its component concepts (“meaning,” “life”), or related ones (“meaningfulness,” “meaninglessness,” “vanity,” “absurdity,” and so forth).

c. The Broader Historical Background

Although nineteenth century thinkers were the first in the West to put the question precisely in the form “What is the meaning of life?” concern with questions in what may be called “the meaning-of-life family,” that is, ultimate questions about life, the world, existence, and its purpose may be found, in the East and the West alike, almost as far back as we can trace human thought about anything. Thus Gilgamesh (c. 2000 B.C.E.) asked why he must die; the composers of The Rig Veda (c. 1200 B.C.E.) wondered where everything came from; Job (c. 500 B.C.E.) asked why he must suffer; the ancient Taoists (Laozi c. 500 B.C.E. and Zhuangzi c. 300 B.C.E.) asked what the origin or principle of everything is, and how one must live to be in accord with it; ancient Upanishadic seekers (500-300 B.C.E.) were much vexed with the nature of the true self and its end or goal; the Buddha (c. 500 B.C.E.), before he became the Buddha, sought an understanding of life that would enable one to overcome suffering; the author of The Bhagavad Gita (c. 200 B.C.E.) was concerned, as other Indian thinkers tended to be, with the identity and nature of the true self, and also with the question of how to live; the ancient Greeks of the classical period (c. 430-320 B.C.E.) talked about the goal or end of life and how to reach it; Epicurus (341-270 B.C.E.) followed suit and developed his own unique take on these matters; Qoheleth, the author of Ecclesiastes (c. 200 B.C.E.), was struck by the vanity or futility of everything and wondered how to deal with it; Greek and Roman Hellenistic philosophers (c. 300 B.C.E. – 250 C.E.)—Epicurean, Stoic, Cynic, Skeptic, and Neo-Platonist—wondered about the good and how to achieve it; Marcus Aurelius (121-180 C.E.) mused on his cosmic insignificance.

The Christian-dominated medieval period did not produce thinkers who asked in any radical way about the meaning of life, because everyone already had a perfectly good answer, the one provided by the Christian story. Still, even in medieval times, there was room for at least three questions in the meaning-of-life family. First, there was occasion for the questions when things ran counter to the Christian story, or to what one expected. Thus Boethius (480-525) was perplexed by the deep questions when, after a life of honor, piety, and power, he fell into disgrace, had everything stripped from him unaccountably and unjustly, and found himself faced with imprisonment that lead eventually to his execution. Second, though the great Christian philosopher-theologians thought they knew the meaning of life in outline, they still asked and answered questions about the details of the final or highest good of man. Thomas Aquinas (1224-1274), for example, who accepted with unblinking assurance the general answer supplied by Christianity, found himself wondering about the exact nature of the summum bonum (the highest good) and about how to square the Christian view of it with that of Aristotle. Third, other Christian believers, medieval ones as well as present-day ones with medieval outlooks, committed to an overall view of what is going on, may be vexed by the question of what God intends for them specifically and may worry about their “calling,” the particular purpose, role, or plan God has especially for them. Hence we find confirmed believers worried deeply about the question, “What is the meaning of my life?”

In any event, since the early modern period, there has been a resurgence of interest in fundamental meaning-of-life questions. Writers as diverse as Shakespeare (1564-1616), Pascal (1623-1662), Dr. Johnson (1709-84), Kant (1724-1804), and Hegel (1770-1831) have asked, in different forms, questions about life’s ultimate point, goal, or purpose, and they are just a few of the many religious, philosophical, and literary figures who have raised and (sometimes) answered ultimate questions in the meaning-of-life family prior to Schopenhauer’s work early in the nineteenth century. There have been philosophers too since Schopenhauer’s time who have addressed the big questions, but not explicitly in terms of “the meaning of life.” This article will confine itself largely to those philosophers who have explicitly put their concerns in those terms.

The standard explanation of the rise of questions about life’s meaning in the early modern period points to three or four distinct but related things: (1) the scientific revolution; (2) the Protestant Reformation; (3) voyages and travels of exploration and discovery, in which were encountered peoples with very different outlooks on the nature of the universe and the meaning of life; and (4), as a result of all of these, the evaporation of a widely held, firmly believed Christian conception of the nature of things.

2. Nineteenth Century Philosophers

Let us turn now to the story of what philosophers from Schopenhauer in the early 1800s to Ayer and Camus in the 1940s have had to say about the meaning of life.

a. Schopenhauer

The first Western philosopher to link the ideas of life and meaning, and to ask expressly “What is the meaning of life?” was the great German pessimist Arthur Schopenhauer (1788-1860). At least he was the first to ask the question and get it noticed by other philosophers. Schopenhauer, a contemporary of Carlyle, wrote in German, in which “the meaning of life” is “der Sinn des Lebens.” Profoundly influencing the thought of both Nietzsche and Tolstoy, Schopenhauer’s work may be regarded as the springboard that launched modern Western philosophical inquiry into the problem of the meaning of life. Here is the passage in which Schopenhauer explicitly asked the question:

Since a man does not alter, and his moral character remains absolutely the same all through his life; since he must play out the part which he has received, without the least deviation from the character; since neither experience, nor philosophy, nor religion can effect any improvement in him, the question arises, What is the meaning of life at all? (1860b) [emphasis added]

The circumstances under which concern with the problem of the meaning of life were, in Schopenhauer’s case, not merely academic but real and personal. Well off financially, but struggling with personal misery and a sense of loneliness and isolation, he felt driven to find some understanding of himself and of the world around him that seemed so bleak and senseless.

Schopenhauer’s philosophy begins with a metaphysical structure he inherited from Kant and more or less simply decrees. There is a difference between the thing-in-itself and the phenomenal world of appearances. The thing-in-itself is the will to live, or, more simply, the will. It is the fundamental power and reality that underlies all things. The world we know and live in, with its stupendous abundance of things and forms, is merely the phenomena of the will, the objectification of it, its mirror, something not entirely real, or not real at all. (There is also a pure, will-less subject of knowledge whose metaphysical status is unclear: sometimes it seems to be in the very realm of the will, the realm of true reality, of things-in-themselves; at other times it seems to be something like the first creation and objectification of the will.)

The will itself just wills. It is pretty nasty, perhaps demonic. It is a blind striving, craving, and grasping, aiming at nothing in the end, except to go on willing and aggrandizing itself. It has in itself an inner contradiction, manifest in the constant struggle and strife between the billions of individual objectifications of itself in the phenomenal world. I am one such objectification; you are another. My true self, my inner essence, is the will; the same is true of you: my essence and yours are one and the same. When we fight (as we usually do), the will is engaged in a battle with itself.

The phenomenal world is an awful place. It is full of misery, pain, suffering. Little happiness is found anywhere. The twin poles of human life are pain (want, desire, stress) and boredom. Almost everyone lives a life that, from without, is meaningless and insignificant and, from within, dull and senseless.

But what is the meaning of life? The question is appropriate because life as we know it is something like Macbeth’s tale told by an idiot, a “farce.” If the question is about life’s inner essence, Schopenhauer’s answer is simply “the will-to-live.” The meaning of life is the will.

Another way of taking the question “What is the meaning of life?” is to construe it as a question about the goal, point, aim, end, or purpose of life. When Schopenhauer explicitly asks the question (in On Human Nature), it is this sense of it he appears to have in mind. His answer is depressing. The point or purpose of life is to suffer. We are being punished for the crime of being born, punished for who we are, namely, the nasty thoroughly egoistic will. The meaning of life in this sense, then, is to suffer, to be punished for our sin.

Schopenhauer suggests a number of ways of thinking about our phenomenal, experienced life. All of them are pretty bleak. He recommends that we look upon our life: as an unprofitable episode interrupting the blessed calm of nothingness; as on the whole a disappointment, nay, a cheat; as Hell, in which on the one hand men are the tormented souls and on the other the tormenting devils; as a place of atonement, a sort of penal colony; as some kind of mistake; and as a process of disillusionment. Any or all of these could be taken as answers to the question “What is the meaning of life?” (or to the question “What is life?”)

If we ask what we should do, how we can give our lives worth and meaning, Schopenhauer does have an answer. “Salvation” lies in the total denial of the will. Knowledge of the will and its horrific phenomena can and should function as a quieter of the will, bringing it to a state in which it stops willing and effectively abolishes itself. Thinking in this vein, a Schopenhauerian might say that the meaning of life is to deny, quiet, and eventually abolish the will to live that is essentially oneself.

One naturally wants to know whether this is not just suicide—whether the cessation of willing simply means that one passes into a state of nothingness. Schopenhauer’s answer is “No.” The state of the will-less individual after death seems to be nothing to us; but our present state would seem to be nothing to him. His state is wonderful and blessed, but what it is like is inconceivable to us.

In our current state, when one denies the will in herself, she does not literally commit suicide. Suicide doesn’t work because it is itself a powerful act of willing. Instead, she practices self-denial and asceticism, cultivates detachment, stops wanting and pursuing the things most people go for; and although there is still some struggle with the dying will in her, on the whole her life becomes full of peace and joy. The will is quieted and eventually abolishes itself in the individual. Very few people are capable of doing this heroic thing, Schopenhauer says, but he himself does not claim to be one of these people.

For all the darkness of his philosophy, the moral for all of us—even those of us who are not prepared to totally deny the will—which Schopenhauer derives in the end is very much in the Christian/Buddhist vein. We should not be competitive or grasping or villainous, but rather we should show compassion and kindness to everyone, since everyone is always having a bad day in this hell we are all living in, and what we all need above all are love, compassion, help, and consideration. The fundamental principle of morality, which you should follow, is: Don’t hurt anyone; help everyone you can. Following this principle, one can achieve, short of complete denial of the will, a kind of half-way salvation.

Another of Schopenhauer’s points about meaning in life should be mentioned. It is that the meaningfulness of one’s life depends not on one’s outer circumstances but rather on the way one looks at life. People look at life differently, and so the meaningfulness of her life varies considerably from person to person. To one person life is barren, dull, and superficial; to another rich, interesting, and full of meaning.

b. Kierkegaard

A major nineteenth century European philosopher who continued the tradition of thought on the meaning of life was the Danish philosopher Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855). Kierkegaard was not an academic. The sources of his interest in problems of meaning seem to have been his not having to work for a living, his personal demons, his Nordic gloom, his congenital tendencies toward guilt, depression, anxiety, and dread, his awareness of increasing doubt all around him of the teachings of his inherited Christianity, and his agonizing failure to live up to his own Christian ideals, primarily because of his embodiment and its concomitant proclivity for the things of the flesh, especially sensuousness and sex. Out of all that emerged what appears to be a severe case of self-loathing, which in turn prompted serious inquiry into the meaning of (his) life.

It is difficult to determine what Kierkegaard’s own views were on just about everything because he constantly used humor, satire, paradox, and irony, and even more because he spoke in different voices and wrote from different perspectives under different pseudonyms.

Nonetheless, the standard view is that Kierkegaard was fundamentally a Christian. He claimed that one’s life can be meaningful and worth living only if one believes genuinely and passionately in the Christian God.

And then there is the leap. Christian belief goes beyond rational evidence, and even conflicts with it. One must make a leap from knowledge to Christian faith—the only thing in which one can find true meaning—a leap over the confines of common sense and reason. One is to accept Christian faith even if (or just because?) it is absurd. For it is the only adequate source of the kind of meaning a human being has to have to keep on going with a sense that life is worthwhile.

Another way to describe Kierkegaard’s overall philosophy is to characterize it in terms of his three stages or levels of life. One should make an ascent from the lowest stage, the aesthetic (sensuous, even sensual), through the higher ethical stage, and on to the highest stage of all, the religious, which somehow baptizes and incorporates the two lower stages into itself. Only one who has reached the religious stage can have a truly meaningful life and thus a life worth living.

Whatever Kierkegaard’s own view was, we can make the following observations about things Kierkegaard (or one or other of his pseudonymous authors) said about the meaning of life.

(1) One thing is that life can seem meaningless. In the early work, Either/Or (1843), we find this passage: “How empty and meaningless life is.” Elsewhere in Either/Or we get similar thoughts and questions, for instance, “What, if anything, is the meaning of this life?” and “My life is utterly meaningless.” Perhaps, though, the idea is that, though life is often meaningless, it need not be so, and, when it is, it is because of some kind of failure of the liver (of the life, not the organ).

(2) A second interesting idea in Kierkegaard is that meaning has something to do with unity. In a meaningful life all the diverse aspects of it come together to form some kind of coherent whole. One pursues some one goal, to which everything in one’s life is subordinated.

(3) A third point, an important one, is that, though meaning is a good thing, it is possible for there to be too much meaning in one’s life, or in its parts. Kierkegaard observes:

No part of life ought to have so much meaning for a person that he cannot forget it any moment he wants to; on the other hand, every single part of life ought to have so much meaning for a person that he can remember it at any moment. (Either/Or)

To have one’s life full of meaning to the brim, to regard life and everything one does in it as infinitely significant, brings with it so much pressure and stress that one’s life becomes unbearable.

To me [says Kierkegaard] it seems . . . that to be known in time by God makes life enormously strenuous. Everywhere where he is present each half hour is of infinite importance. Yet to live like that for sixty years is unsupportable. It is difficult enough putting up even with the three years’ hard study for an examination, and those are still not as strenuous as half an hour like this. (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(4) A fourth idea about meaning in Kierkegaard is the idea that one can give one’s life meaning, or that one can acquire meaning in life, by doing something like devoting oneself to something. Of Antigone he says, “her life acquires meaning for her in its devotion to showing him [her father, after his death] the last honors daily, almost hourly, by her unbroken silence.” (Either/Or)

(5) Meaning does not come from abstract, objective knowledge of any kind, whether philosophical, or scientific, or historical, or even theological. It comes from some kind of faith, a faith that is passionately acquired and lived daily.

(6) One twentieth century approach to the problem of the meaning of life is to see, accept, and bask more or less happily in the absurdity of life. Kierkegaard anticipated this approach prophetically in his characterization of the “humorist.” Kierkegaard writes: “Weary of time and its endless succession, the humorist runs away and finds humorous relief in stating the absurd.” (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(7) Kierkegaard’s humorist also at one point expresses a view which is surprisingly rare, namely, the view that one’s life may have a meaning, but one doesn’t know what it is. Kierkegaard writes: “[L]et a humorist say what he has in mind and he will speak, for example, as follows: What is the meaning of life? Yes, good question. How should I know?” (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(8) Although Kierkegaard himself was a Christian who viewed meaning as ultimately grounded in religious faith, in one’s personal relation to a supernatural God, yet, paradoxically perhaps, and certainly in an admirable spirit of non-exclusivity, he said:

It is possible both to enjoy life and to give it meaning and substance outside Christianity, just as the most famous poets and artists, the most eminent of thinkers, even men of piety, have lived outside Christianity (Concluding Unscientific Postscript).

(9) One finds in Kierkegaard the idea that life has meaning only insofar as it is related in some way to the Infinite. Nothing finite can supply the meaning of life.

On the whole, if for no other reason, Kierkegaard’s work is valuable because of its suggestiveness. Under one pseudonym or another, Kierkegaard made many important points which were taken up, or unfortunately overlooked, by subsequent philosophers concerned with the meaning of life.

c. Nietzsche

Friedrich Nietzsche (1844-1900) cut his philosophical teeth on Schopenhauer and devoted himself in his later works—from 1883 up to the onset of insanity in January 1889—to struggle with, among other things, the meaning of life.

Nietzsche’s grand project was the revaluation of all values. Part of this project was that of giving to life a new meaning. Nietzsche’s interest in the matter was not merely academic. Coming up with new values and giving life a new meaning was a project that involved a total transformation of Nietzsche’s own self, early versions of which he became dissatisfied with. One thing Nietzsche wanted to do was to produce an affirmative philosophy of life to replace Schopenhauer’s pessimistic, life-denying philosophy.

Nietzsche rejected Schopenhauer’s picture of life as suffering, or punishment for one’s sin, together with its ethic of compassion toward the poor and the sick. Such a picture belonged to a weak, sick, decadent, nay-saying mode of being in decline. Nietzsche himself wanted to produce a positive, healthy, life-affirming philosophy, one suitable for life in the ascendant.

Sometimes, particularly early in his writings, Nietzsche seemed to think some end or other is required to make things meaningful. At times, both early and late, Nietzsche spoke as though the very concept of the meaning of something is the concept of its end, object, or goal.

In other places, however, Nietzsche spoke as if the meaning of life lies in freedom from, not in the achievement of, ends. Perhaps this should be construed as the rejection of given ends to be discovered, not in the rejection of all ends, particularly those one creates. Moritz Schlick—whose thought we will consider in more detail later—claimed that Nietzsche saw that life has no meaning so long as it stands wholly under the domination of purposes. In Nietzsche’s Zarathustra, “Sir Hazard,” expressing Nietzsche’s own considered view, says, “I have saved them from the slavery of ends.” (Klemke, 3^rd ed., 63).

Nietzsche sometimes spoke as if life, before he came into it, or before he revaluated all values, had no meaning: “Sombre is human life, and as yet without meaning: a buffoon may be fateful to it” (Thus Spake Zarathustra, 1883). There is no meaning “out there” to be discovered, no meaning in the essences of things, apart from human will, desire, perspective. In fact, apart from perspective, there is no world out there at all, no “thing-in-itself,” no “facts-in-themselves.” But a psychologically strong person can do without things in themselves and meaning (already there) to be discovered in them. That is because he can organize a small part of the world himself and thus create meaning. In The Will to Power, Nietzsche speaks of “the creative strength to create meaning,” and he says:

It is a measure of the degree of strength of will to what extent one can do without meaning in things, to what extent one can endure to live in a meaningless world because one organizes a small portion of it oneself. (The Will to Power)

Whatever the meaning of life is, or is to be, it is terrestrial, not celestial. Meaning must not be placed in some fabricated “true world” but in this very earth in which we live and have our being. And the meaning of life is to be created, not discovered.

Still, somehow, man is not the meaning and measure of all things, though he has posited himself as such.

All the values by means of which we have tried so far to render the world estimable for ourselves and which then proved inapplicable and therefore devaluated the world—all these values are, psychologically considered, the results of certain perspectives of utility, designed to maintain and increase human constructs of domination—and they have been falsely projected into the essence of things. What we find here is still the hyperbolic naiveté of man: positing himself as the meaning and measure of the value of things. (The Will to Power)

The mistake lies in projecting our own values onto reality, in thinking that our meaning and values are present in things as such. But our meaning does not lie in “things-in-themselves.” It is created by us. If we then give things out there such and such a meaning, we should recognize that it is not a meaning we have found in the things themselves, but rather one that we have given them.

We can still ask, What is the meaning of life? What is the meaning we shall give to life? Nietzsche gives two different answers. One is that the meaning of life is the Übermensch (sometimes translated as ‘Superman’), Nietzsche’s post-human creator of meaning, affirmer of life, and bearer of values.

I want to teach men the sense of their existence, which is the Superman, the lightning out of the dark cloud—man. (Thus Spake Zarathustra)

The Superman is the meaning of the earth. Let your will say: The Superman SHALL BE the meaning of the earth! (Thus Spake Zarathustra)

The other answer is that the meaning of life is the will to power.

All meaning is will to power. (The Will to Power)

On the surface these two answers are different. But perhaps they are consistent. Perhaps what the will to power generates is the Superman, or what the Superman represents is the will to power. Again, perhaps the will to power is the meaning of life in the sense of its kernel or essence, while the Superman is its meaning in the sense of its end or goal.

Nietzsche’s view has some aspects or consequences that should be noted. One consequence of Nietzsche’s view is that the meaning of life is absent in the old and the sick. He acknowledged the fact. Another consequence (or perhaps component) of Nietzsche’s view is that nihilism, the denial of all value, is a transitional stage, not the finale. Yet another consequence is that the meaning of life is not about the predominance of pleasure over pain. Concern with that evidences only nihilism. Finally, it may be conjectured that Nietzsche would probably regard with scorn those of us in the current debate among academic philosophers about the meaning of life. He would consider us “minute” philosophers:

The study of the minute philosophers is only interesting for the recognition that they have reached those stages in the great edifice of philosophy where learned disquisitions for and against, where hair-splitting objections and counter-objections are the rule: and for that reason they evade the demand of every great philosophy to speak sub specie aeternitatis. (Nietzsche, 1874)

d. Tolstoy

One of the next thinkers in the Western intellectual tradition to ask seriously the question, “What is the meaning of life?” was the great Russian novelist and moralist Count Leo Tolstoy (1828-1910). He asked the question and offered part of an answer in A Confession, written in Russian in 1879, circulated in 1882, and translated and published in 1884. Tolstoy’s reflections on the question stimulated a great deal of subsequent debate on the issue.

Although characters in his earlier works, such as War and Peace, sometimes talked about the meaning of life and felt the problem deeply, Tolstoy himself raised serious questions about it only as part of a psychological crisis he underwent in the mid to late 1870s. Despite having everything anyone could ever want—wealth, fame, status, love, physical strength, and so forth—Tolstoy found himself severely disturbed. His symptoms were depression, psychological paralysis, obsession with suicide, and the continual recurrence in his head of the question of the meaning of life.

Tolstoy put his question about the meaning of life in several different ways. Here are some of them, listed in order of their occurrence in his Confession:

What is it for? What does it lead to? Why? What then? What for? But what does it matter to me? What of it? Why go on making any effort? How go on living? What will come of what I am doing today or shall do tomorrow? What will come of my whole life? Why should I live, why wish for anything, or do anything? Is there any meaning in my life that the inevitable death awaiting me does not destroy? What am I, with my desires? Why do I live? What must I do? What is the meaning of my life? Why do I exist?

Several of these seem to be quite different questions, but Tolstoy regarded them all as the same question put in different ways.

Tolstoy said explicitly that his question was not about the composition, origin, and fate of the universe, nor again about the question, “What is the life of the whole?” That question, Tolstoy said, is unanswerable for a single man, and it is “stupidity” to think an individual must first answer the question about the meaning of the universe or the whole of humanity before he can answer the question of the meaning of his own life.

Tolstoy came to think that he should not expect to find the answers to his questions in philosophy. The legitimate task of philosophy is merely to ask the question and perhaps refine and clarify it, not to answer it, which it cannot do.

This view of philosophy as incapable of providing answers to the questions of life must have been one Tolstoy came to some way into his crisis. At another point, apparently earlier, Tolstoy did try to find answers in philosophy (as well as in the mathematical, physical, biological, and social sciences). The philosophers he studied were Socrates, the Buddha, “Solomon” (the author of Ecclesiastes), and Schopenhauer.

All of these he interpreted as providing a negative answer. The gist of Socrates’ thought is that the true philosopher seeks death, because the life of the body, with all its ailments and desires, is an impediment to what he is really all about, namely, the quest for truth. The individual life of the physically discrete individual is pretty meaningless, something one would rather do without. The Buddha, as Tolstoy read him, teaches that life is the greatest of evils and works as hard as he can to free himself from it. “Solomon” teaches that it’s all “vanity.” And Schopenhauer, as Tolstoy understood him, wishes for, and advocates, annihilation.

In a nutshell, Tolstoy’s problem was this: since I will suffer, die, be forgotten, and make no difference (leave no trace) in the long run, how does my life, or anything I do, have any meaning? It was a problem he felt deeply. He had to have an answer to go on living. Tolstoy’s concern with the issue was not merely theoretical.

The solution to the problem that Tolstoy eventually came to was one he thought had been known all along by the unlearned peasants. The solution lies in a kind of irrational knowledge called “faith.” Faith is faith in God, and lived faith involves some kind of relation to the Infinite. Meaning is found in the appropriate relationship to God, the Infinite. Tolstoy’s solution bears obvious resemblances to Kierkegaard’s and is very much in the same spirit.

Tolstoy spent the rest of his life working out the details of, or variations on, this solution. The progress of his thought can be traced in What I Believe and On Life, as well as in his late short fiction (The Death of Ivan Ilych, Father Sergius, and so forth). To the end Tolstoy held that faith in God, work, service to others, unselfishness, and love are essential parts of a meaningful life. He taught that the things ordinarily pursued by many—wealth, status, power, fame—contribute nothing to the meaningfulness of life.

e. Some Common Aspects of the Lives of Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy

Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy all had lives which rendered them virtual breeding grounds for problems with the meaning of life. (1) All of them were well off and did not have to work for a living; there is no evidence that any of them ever felt a real threat of, say, homelessness or starvation. Nietzsche was the one that wasn’t exactly wealthy, but in his case his early retirement (in his late twenties) provided him with a pension for life sufficient to meet his material needs and free him up for a life of thought and writing. (2) All of them suffered from psychological illness of one sort or another—at the very least, a sense of gloom or melancholy, and in some cases a sense of worthlessness and a preoccupation with suicide, or feelings of dread and anxiety, or the encroachment of outright madness. (3) All of them grew up in religious environments, the tenets of which they lost faith in when they reached adulthood, and the lack of which they struggled with throughout their lives (eventually regaining, in the cases of Kierkegaard and Tolstoy, some portion of what they had lost). (4) None of them was a professional academician, except for Nietzsche in his youth.

From these four, and from our own experiences of life, we have inherited, to the extent that we have it, our preoccupation with the meaning of life.

3. Early Twentieth Century Continental Philosophers

In the early twentieth century questions about the meaning of life continued to be of interest to leading European or “Continental” philosophers.

a. Heidegger

The great German philosophy professor Martin Heidegger (1889-1976) was certainly concerned with the meaning of life. He presented two different outlooks, which we may call “early Heidegger” and “later Heidegger.”

For early Heidegger (that is, the Heidegger of Being and Time, 1927), the question of the meaning of life is the question how we can live an “authentic” life, one that is our life, not just the life for us that has been fixed by the community we live in. His answer is that to live a meaningful life is to live a life of authenticity. To live a life authenticity is to live a life that one oneself chooses, not the life that is prescribed for one by one’s social situation. To live a life of authenticity, one must have a plan, something that unifies one’s life into an organic whole. This is one’s own plan. So a meaningful life is one of focused authenticity. “Authenticity is Heidegger’s accounted of what it is to live a meaningful life.”

Living authentically, it turns out, is a matter of living in a way that is true to your heritage. “Being true to heritage is being true to your own, deepest self.” In the end, the content of authenticity is not something you freely choose ex nihilo, but rather something you discover in the conjunction of heritage and facticity.

Early Heidegger’s thought seems to be a kind of pantheism, and it is possible that Heidegger subscribed to some such view all his life.

Later Heidegger proposes a somewhat different view. In this philosophy of his, we are given the task, in which our meaning lies, of being “guardians of the world.” The world is a holy place. To understand and appreciate that fact is to exhibit not just a certain intellectual and practical stance toward the world, but to live with an attitude of respect and reverence toward the world, toward the natural world especially. Later Heidegger saw exploitation of the natural world, as in mining and highway-building, as deplorable, as contrary to the very meaning of life. The meaning of life is guardianship of the world.

b. Sartre

The French philosopher Jean-Paul Sartre (1905-1980) changed his views over the course of his life. In his work Being and Nothingness (1943), advocated an outlook from which life is absurd. We more or less seriously pursue goals which, from a detached standpoint, we can see don’t really matter. But we continue to act as though they do, and hence our lives are absurd. The Sartrean project is to overcome this detached standpoint, or to incorporate it into our lives.

The problem is other people. They insist on their own reality. They tend to get in the way of our pursuit of our own goals.

Later on, Sartre espoused a somewhat different view. On this new view, “our fundamental goal in life is to overcome our ‘contingency’,” to become the foundation of our own being. The main obstacle (again) is other people who, on the one hand, pursue their own (different) goals and, on the other, propose a real (military) threat to one’s way of life and one’s homeland.

In his 1944 play, No Exit, there is the famous line: “Hell is other people.” Other people do not cooperate with my projects, and I do not cooperate with theirs. The result is war, in something like Schopenhauer’s sense. People are always at war, or at least at odds, with each other.

In both his early and his later thought, Sartre ends up being pretty pessimistic and depressing. Life is meaningless. We can, by our free choice, give life some meaning or other. But the decision to do so is itself a matter of ungrounded free choice, which is such that it doesn’t matter whether that decision or some other one is made.

c. Camus

Albert Camus (1913-1960), a Frenchman born in Algeria, was one of the leading existentialists (though he himself disowned the label) and one of the more influential writers of the first half of the twentieth century. He was familiar with the work of Nietzsche, and greatly influenced by it.

On our theme, Camus’s starting point was the perception of the absurd. Human life, he felt, was absurd, meaningless, and senseless. The way in which it is, or the reason it is, lies in an inevitable clash between the needs and aspirations of human beings and the cold, meaningless world.

This clash has at least four facets. First, we seek—demand, even—a rational understanding of things, some way of seeing the world as familiar to us. But the world does not cooperate: to us, it is ultimately unintelligible. Second, we long for some kind of unity underlying and organizing the manifest diversity we find all around us. But again, the world is heedless of our longings. The world that presents itself to our senses is nothing but disjointed plurality. Third, we long for a higher reality (a God, for example), something transcendent, some cosmic meaning of everything. But no such meaning can be discerned. Fourth, we strive for continued life, or at least to achieve something permanent in the end. But our efforts are pointless, everything will come to nothing, and all that lies ahead is death and oblivion.

Our situation is like that of the mythical Greek of old, Sisyphus. We are condemned, as it were, to pushing a rock up a hill, over and over only to see it roll back down again, every time, when it reaches the top. Pointless labor is Sisyphus’ lot, and ours too.

The pointlessness and absurdity of life raise the question of suicide. Should we kill ourselves? Camus’s answer is that, no, we should not. Suicide is escapist. To kill yourself is to give in, to lose. If we were prisoners of war—which is something like what we are—our captor and tormentor would want us to do exactly that—confess that things are too much for us and kill ourselves. That would be his ultimate victory, which would bring him a chuckle, or perhaps even a hearty guffaw.

How then should we live? The first thing to do is to insist that life is better if there is no meaning. That would really irritate our tormentor. Second, we should cultivate a mindset of honesty and lucidity. We should not indulge in denial, or evasion, or imaginings of an eventual escape into an afterlife where everything will be put right. We should acknowledge that life is awful—but then, perhaps, add “and I love it” or “all is well.” Third, we should take up an attitude of revolt, defiance, and scorn. Camus observes, “There is no fate that cannot be surmounted by scorn.” Surely such an attitude would vex our hypothetical tormentor beyond measure. Fourth, we should live for now, stop worrying about the future, stop striving to achieve future goals. Nothing is going to come of anything we do in the long run anyway. Fifth, we should “use everything up”: work hard, play hard, approach everything with zest and passion, expend energy to the human limit. This amounts to a kind of perverse “Yes!” to life. Finally, we may ask why anyone would want to live like this? Is it something that would appeal only to the French? What are the advantages of such an attitude toward life?

Camus has answers to these queries, three in fact. First, living as he recommends is a way of salvaging our dignity, and it is a way to which a certain majesty adheres. Second, surprisingly perhaps, such a way of living brings with it a “curious joy.” Third, it is the way of freedom. Camus’s scornful existentialism is the best conception we have of a truly free human being, one who does not allow himself to be shaped and determined by the mindless, meaningless world that surrounds him.

4. Early Twentieth Century Analytic, American, and English-Language Philosophers

Anglo-American philosophers in the very late eighteenth and early twentieth centuries continued to be interested in problems of the meaning of life as well.

a. James

The American pragmatist philosopher William James (1842-1910), a Harvard professor, wrote a couple of interesting essays on our theme in the late 1890s. Both essays were written as addresses to be delivered to live audiences. They demand some discussion and consideration.

In “Is Life Worth Living?” (1895), James reveals deep, probably first-person, familiarity, with the existential source of concern with the issues of the meaning and worthwhileness of life. He calls it the “profounder bass-note of life” and suggests that it is to be found, or heard, somewhere in all of us: “In the deepest heart of all of us there is a corner in which the ultimate mystery of things works sadly.” (1895: 32)

Some people are so naturally optimistic and in love with life that they are constitutionally incapable of being much bothered by the bass-note and pay it little attention. James’s example of such a person is Walt Whitman; and one thinks of the English. James finds no fault—intellectual, moral, or otherwise—with such people. It is rare good fortune to be blessed with such a temperament. If everyone were, the question of the worthwhileness of life would never arise.

But for every Whitman, there is a suicide, and a thinker of the dreary constitution of the poet James Thomson, author of “The City of Dreadful Night.”

In his address, James imagines himself in discussion with a would-be suicide whom he tries to persuade to take up his burden and see life through to its natural end. James acknowledges that some of these suicides—perhaps the majority of them—are too far gone to have anything said to them, for instance, those whose suicidal impulses are due to insanity or sudden fits of frenzy. It is to the class of reflective would-be suicides—those disposed to kill themselves because of their thinking, reading, and brooding on the darker side of life—that James directs his remarks. It is these he wants to cheer up (or comfort) and keep alive.

James speaks of two stages of recovery from suicidal illness. The first stage includes three elements, three palliatives, for the suicidal condition. First, there is the thought, “You can end it whenever you will.” This strikes one as a strange thought to recommend to one contemplating suicide. But James thinks the thought can be a comfort. It means there’s no particular guilt or stigma attached to suicide. It means one won’t have to put up with this miserable world forever; one can opt out whenever one wants. It may delay the act by encouraging the thought, “Why kill myself today when I can always do it tomorrow?” Second, James points out, there is in human beings a natural sense of curiosity. It is worth hanging around a while longer in order to see the headlines of tomorrow’s newspaper. Third, there is a certain fighting instinct in human beings. James thinks the normal man has a reason to go on, even if the whole thing is worthless and meaningless, as long as there is some injustice to be put right, some villain to be put down, or some evil to overcome in the little corner of the universe he inhabits. The three things just mentioned all lie in the first stage of recovery, one that is partial and inferior to what lies in the second stage.

The second stage is one of full recovery. It is the religious stage. It gives one assurance of a fully worthwhile and meaningful life.

James’s injunction is to believe—to believe in a supernatural, spiritual order of things which overcomes and makes right the deficiencies of the natural order as we know it. We do not have rational or evidential proof that such a supernatural order exists. But Kant proved that natural science cannot prove that such an order does not exist. To make one’s life worthwhile and meaningful, all one has to do is to posit faith in such an order, to believe that there is a spiritual realm in which all the wrongs of the natural order are righted. In that case, one will view the natural order as an inadequate representation of the spiritual, or as a veil through which the true and wonderful nature of the spiritual is hidden or obscured.

One need have little conception of what the spiritual realm is like. The content of the belief in it can be quite minimal. All one needs to affirm is that there is such a realm and that its reality makes life worthwhile. James draws on two of the tenets of his pragmatism to support such an approach to the meaning and worthwhileness of life. One is the right to believe what we need to believe, even though it goes beyond belief warranted by empirical and rational evidence. His classic case for the right of such belief is in his essay, “The Will to Believe.”

Another tenet of pragmatism on which James draws is the idea that belief is a matter of action. To believe something is not so much to have a certain mental state as to act in a certain way. Whatever is in one’s mind, to act as though life is worthwhile and has meaning is to believe that it does

In “What Makes a Life Significant” (1899), James expressly addressed the question of the significance or meaning of life. What he said in this essay was rather different from what he had said in the previous one. The essay was in part a response to the deification of the uneducated, hard-working peasants in Tolstoy’s Confession. James admired Tolstoy a great deal but felt he went a bit overboard in his praise of peasant life and in his tendency to identify it as the very locus of meaning. James held that the lives of Tolstoy’s peasants were full of one ingredient necessary for a meaningful life—toil, struggle, pluck, will, suffering, manly virtues—but that they lacked the other necessary ingredient for a fully meaningful life, namely, what James called “ideals.”

Toward the end of the essay, James gives his own view. He states it in two or three different ways, the sense of which seems to be the same. “[I]deal visions” must be backed “with what the laborers have, the sterner stuff of manly virtue.”

[T]o redeem life from insignificance, [c]ulture and refinement all alone are not enough. . . . Ideal aspirations are not enough, when uncombined with pluck and will. . . . There must be some sort of fusion, some chemical combination among these principles, for a life objectively and thoroughly significant to result. (1899: 877)

The solid meaning of life is always the same eternal thing,—the marriage, namely, of some unhabitual ideal, however special, with some fidelity, courage, and endurance; with some man’s or woman’s pains.—And, whatever or wherever life may be, there will always be the chance for that marriage to take place. (1899: 878)

James is rather vague about what the “ideals” are, or even what they are like. In at least some cases they have something to do with culture and refinement, but it seems that they can and will vary from person to person, and may reside in some form in the uncultured and unrefined. In any event, it is noteworthy that James does not bring up the subject of religion. There is no suggestion that belief in God or a spiritual world is necessary for a fully meaningful life. An ideal wedded to manly virtue is enough.

b. Russell

The British philosopher Bertrand Russell (1872-1970) is often portrayed as one of those early twentieth century analytic philosophers who had no patience for big questions, such as that of the meaning of life. The portrayal is often reinforced by the famous story of Russell and the cab-driver, to whom Russell had nothing to say about the meaning of life.

It is true that Russell sometimes expressed a dismissive attitude toward the question: to Hugh Moorhead he said, “Unless you assume a God, the question (of life’s meaning) is meaningless” (Metz 2013b: 23), and to the taxi-driver he had indeed nothing to say about the meaning of life. But elsewhere he seems to have taken the question very seriously.

In “A Free Man’s Worship,” he begins with a fairly gloomy, despairing picture of the world science reveals to us, the only world there is, really. It is purposeless, void of meaning. The causes that produced us had no prevision of the end they were achieving. We ourselves, and everything precious to us, are the outcome of the accidental collocations of atoms. There is no life for the individual beyond the grave. The existence of our very species, along with all its achievements, will eventually be extinguished in the death of the solar system and “buried beneath the debris of a universe in ruins.”

But the thing for us to do is to maintain our ideals against the hostile universe. That universe knows the value of raw power, and not much else. Let us not worship it, as did Nietzsche. In exalting the will to power, Nietzsche was failing to maintain the highest human ideals in the face of the cruel world; he was, in a sense, giving in, capitulating, prostrately submitting to evil, sacrificing his best to Moloch.

Let us be clear-sighted and honest. Let us recognize that the facts are often bad, that in the world we know there are many things that would have been better otherwise, that our ideals are not in fact realized in the world.

But, again, in our minds and hearts, even though the whole business may be futile, let us tenaciously cling to our ideals, loving truth and beauty. Let us renounce power. Let us worship only the God created by our own love of the good. Let us live constantly in the vision of the good.

One trap we must guard against falling into is that which (Russell would think) Camus fell into some decades later. We should not cultivate and live in a spirit of fiery revolt, of fierce hatred of the senseless universe. Why not? Because indignation is still a kind of bondage, for it compels our thoughts to be occupied with the evil world. Give up the indignation so that your thoughts can be free. From freedom of thought comes art, philosophy, and the vision of beauty.

To achieve this we must develop a kind of detachment from our own personal happiness, must learn to free ourselves from the burden of concern for petty things and personal goods.

To abandon the struggle for private happiness, to expel all eagerness of temporary desire, to burn with passion for eternal things–this is emancipation, and this is the free man’s worship. (Russell 1903: 61)

In The Conquest of Happiness Russell makes a couple of remarks about the meaning of life that are worthy of note. The first is this:

The habit of looking to the future and thinking that the whole meaning of the present lies in what it will bring forth is a pernicious one. There can be no value in the whole unless there is value in the parts. Life is not to be conceived on the analogy of a melodrama in which the hero and heroine go through incredible misfortunes for which they are compensated by a happy ending. (1930: 29)

The second is odd but interesting, perhaps not the kind of thought that would occur to most people:

the human heart as modern civilisation has made it is more prone to hatred than to friendship. And it is prone to hatred because it is dissatisfied, because it feels deeply, perhaps even unconsciously, that it has somehow missed the meaning of life, that perhaps others, but not we ourselves, have secured the good things which nature offers man’s enjoyment. (1930: 75)

The thought seems to be that people hate each other because they think others have achieved (or know?) the meaning of life and they don’t. If that is true, one should be careful not to let on that he knows the meaning of life, even if he does.

Several writers have advocated focus and have thought of a life organized by one big project or goal as the paradigm case of a meaningful one. Russell rejects the idea.

All our affections are at the mercy of death, which may strike down those whom we love at any moment. It is therefore necessary that our lives should not have that narrow intensity which puts the whole meaning and purpose of our life at the mercy of accident. For all these reasons the man who pursues happiness wisely will aim at the possession of a number of subsidiary interests in addition to those central ones upon which his life is built. (1930: 177)

Finally, in “The Place of Science in a Liberal Education,” Russell makes the now familiar point that the meaning of life must come not from without but from within.

The search for an outside meaning that can compel an inner response must always be disappointed: all “meaning” must be at bottom related to our primary desires, and when they are extinct no miracle can restore to the world the value which they reflected upon it. (Mysticism and Logic, ch. 2, “The Place of Science in a Liberal Education”)

That is not to say that the meaning of life is created or chosen as opposed to discovered. For our primary desires are something largely given, something (if we are lucky) we simply find in ourselves.

c. Schlick

Moritz Schlick (1882-1936) was one of the central figures of the logical positivist movement. Thinkers in the movement are commonly said to have been dismissive of such “metaphysical” questions as that of the meaning of life. Yet Schlick for one was in no way dismissive. He described himself as a seeker of the meaning of life and wrote an extremely interesting essay on the topic in 1927.

Schlick’s contribution to the debate is (to some) one of the most appealing writings in the whole of the literature. Schlick was aware of Schopenhauer’s musings and was concerned to escape his dire conclusions. Schlick found his answer in (his interpretation of) Nietzsche’s Thus Spake Zarathustra. The answer is that life can be meaningful only if it is freed from its subjugation to ends and purposes. The suggestion is radical: a life has meaning only if it does not have some end or purpose to which everything is subordinated.

Schlick argued that the meaning of life is to be found not in work but in play. Work, in the philosophical sense, is always something done not for its own sake but for the sake of something else, some end or purpose that is to be achieved. Most often that end is the survival and perpetuation of life—that is, more work functioning only to perpetuate the life of the species. But it is absurd to take the meaning of life to lie in the continued survival of the species, or in the work required to make that survival possible. The meaning of life must lie in the content of existence, not in bare existence as such.

What then is the meaning of life? One candidate that suggests itself is feelings of pleasure and happiness. But Schlick rejects that candidate, partly on the grounds that pleasure is likely only to lead to the satiety and boredom which Schopenhauer so vividly made us aware of. Schlick also rejects the ideal of happiness as the meaning of life by way of the observation that man is essentially an active creature for which a life of idle pleasure is by no means suitable. What Schlick ends up saying is that the meaning of life is to be found in play, that is, in activity engaged in for its own glorious sake and not for the furtherance of some further end or goal. Doing something only in order to produce some further end or goal is work, and work cannot be the meaning of life. Of course, work is necessary for human existence and thriving, but it is meaningful only if it can—and it can be—turned into play, something one would do with delight even if nothing came of it in the end.

Schlick backs off from saying that the meaning of life is play. Instead, he says that the meaning of life is youth, since youth is the period of life in which play predominates. A nice consequence of this position is the fact that a life cut short in its infancy or youth is a meaningful life. If you are killed when you are ten years old, it is likely that you lived a life full of meaning.

One other aspect of Schlick’s view should be mentioned. It is that youth is not literally a matter of how long one has lived on this earth. If an old fellow turns his work into play, if he performs it primarily for the sake of the sheer joy of doing it, then he is young in the sense that matters. The key to a fully meaningful life would be to stay forever young.

d. Tagore

The Bengali Indian poet, short-story writer, novelist, dramatist, artist, sage, and philosopher Rabindranath Tagore (1861-1941), often credited with a major role in the cross-fertilization of East and West, won the Nobel Prize in literature in 1919. He wrote in English (sometimes). He knew the works of Einstein, Yeats, Wordsworth, and a host of other Western thinkers. In 1930 he delivered the Hibbert Lectures at Oxford, published the next year as The Religion of Man (1931), a remarkable volume containing much reflection on the meaning of life. This article will limit itself to consideration of a couple of points in that book.

Tagore is interesting because his interest in the question of the meaning of life did not arise out of anything like the circumstances which seemed to create the interest in so many Western thinkers. Tagore was not well-off and bored, he did not suffer from depression and existential angst, he did not worry about the importance of his personal life in the vast scheme of things, he was not a professional academic philosopher.

Tagore’s tendency was to view the question of the meaning of life as the question, “What is man?” or “What am I?” His answer seems to have been that the true human is the universal self, or the true Man represented by the life of the species, or even by the life of all beings.

If he had a problem, it lay in the chaotic, hodgepodge nature of this everyday life. Not exactly seeking for a solution to the predicament, one came to him on an ordinary day on which he was just living his everyday life in east India. He gives a gripping and poetic account of it in chapter six of The Religion of Man. He writes:

Suddenly I became conscious of a stirring of soul within me. My world of experience in a moment seemed to become lighted, and the facts that were detached and dim found a great unity of meaning. The feeling which I had was like that which a man, groping through a fog without knowing his destination, might fee when he suddenly discovers that he stands before his own house. (Tagore 1931, 95)

One thing that is noteworthy in this is that Tagore felt he had seen the meaning of life, not when he realized that his life really mattered, or added up to something sub specie aeternitatus, nor when he came up with a view of things that rid him of his angst and depression, but rather when he found that his life was part of a great unity of meaning. He saw meaning when everything, including his individual life, was one unified whole.

A second feature of Tagore’s conception of the meaning of life is the role he gives to detachment. The detachment that is relevant seems to be something like non-attachment to the petty concerns of one’s own individual life. It is not a lack of concern for anything and everything. It is lack of concern for how one’s own individual, personal life fares. The appropriately detached person places his interest in how Man as the eternal being, or beings of any sort ultimately fare. (There is an admirable concern for all life, not just human life in the thought of Tagore.) The appropriately detached man loses concern for his personal triumphs and failures and cultivates an enlivening interest in the life of the whole, with which, instead of his personal life, he identifies himself. The result is a vast increase in the sense of meaningfulness in his own life.

e. Ayer

A very different approach to the problem of the meaning of life was taken by the prominent logical positivist English philosopher A. J. Ayer (1910-1989).

Ayer argued, in an important 1947 paper, that “there is no sense in asking what is the ultimate purpose of our existence, or what is the real meaning of life” (Ayer 1947: 201). His argument is that there is no reason to believe in anything like a God who created us and intended us for a specific purpose. And even if there were such a God, his purposes could not give life meaning unless we agreed with them and accepted them. Thus the meaning of life always comes back to what we as individuals purpose, value, and aim at. There is no meaning out there to be discovered.

Ayer insists that the meaninglessness of life is nothing to cry about. One’s life has whatever meaning one gives it. It just doesn’t make sense to ask about the meaning of life because there is not, and could not be, such a thing. The question “What is the meaning of life?” is illogical and unanswerable. But a person can give his life a meaning, and if he does, it will be meaningful to him. It will come down to the value judgments the person makes. And these are a matter of personal choice and preference. There is no sense in saying that one person’s value judgments are true and another’s false. Give your life a meaning, and that’s the meaning it will have.

5. Conclusion

The dismissal of the question about the meaning of life which was characteristic of Ayer and his generation, and Camus’s idea that meaninglessness doesn’t matter, may be what ironically sparked the recent interest in the question. The natural philosophical response is that surely the question of the meaning of life is meaningful and important: in light of the remarks of Ayer, Camus, and their ilk, how is that so? A sense that the meaning of life must be a philosophical problem that matters has motivated work on the question of what the question of the meaning of life is all about, if we do not take Ayer’s dismissive attitude and Camus’s stance toward it. The work of Richard Taylor, Robert Nozick, Thomas Nagel, Joel Feinberg, Harry Frankfurt, Susan Wolf, Thaddeus Metz, Joshua Seachris, Julian Young, John Cottingham, David Benatar, and Garrett Thomson (among others) are attempts to answer this question.

The preceding survey brings us up to around 1950, just before a veritable explosion of works on the meaning of life took place in philosophy, especially in the Anglo-analytic tradition. Those interested in this explosion should begin by consulting the excellent overviews in Thaddeus Metz’s article in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Metz 2013) and Joshua Seachris’s article in The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Seachris 2012).

6. References and Further Reading

Ayer, A. J. “The Claims of Philosophy.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life, 3rd Ed.. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 2008: 199-202. (Originally published in 1947)
Baier, K. “The Meaning of Life.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 81-117. (Originally published in 1947.)
Camus, A. “The Myth of Sisyphus.” J. O’Brien (tr.). Reprinted in part in Ways of Wisdom: Readings on the Good Life, Steve Smith (ed.). Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1983: 244-255. (Originally published in French in 1943.)
Carlyle, T. 1834. Fraser’s Magazine. available online at Project Gutenberg.
Heidegger, M. Being and Time. J. Macquarrie and J. Robinson (trs.). Oxford: Blackwell, 1973. (Originally published in German in 1927.)
James, W. “Is Life Worth Living?.” in The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy, New York: Dover Publications, 1956: 32-62. (Originally published in 1895.)
James, W. “What Makes a Life Significant?.” in On Some of Life’s Ideals. New York: Henry Holt and Company, 1899: 49–94. Reprinted in William James: Writings 1878-1899. New York: The Library of America, 1992: 861-80.
Kierkegaard, S. Concluding Unscientific Postscript. (Available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in Danish in 1846.)
Kierkegaard, S. Either/Or: A Fragment of Life. (Available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in Danish in 1843.)
Klemke, E. D. (ed.). The Meaning of Life. New York: Oxford University Press, 1981.
Klemke, E. D. (ed.). The Meaning of Life. 2nd Ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Klemke, E. D. & Cahn, S. (eds.). The Meaning of Life: A Reader, 3rd Ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2008.
Metz, T. “The Meaning of Life.” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2013 Edition). Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
Nagel, T. “The Absurd,” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 151-161. (Originally published in 1971.)
Nietzsche, F. Ecce Homo. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1888-1889.)
Nietzsche, F. On the Genealogy of Morals. Ian Johnston (tr.). 2009.
Nietzsche, F. Thus Spake Zarathustra. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1883-1885.)
Nietzsche, F. Twilight of the Idols. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1888-1899.)
Nietzsche, F. The Will to Power. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in German in 1901-1911.)
The Oxford English Dictionary. Oxford: Oxford University Press: 2014.
Russell, B. “A Free Man’s Worship.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 55-62. (Originally published in 1903.)
Russell, B. The Conquest of Happiness. London: Liveright, 1930.
Sartre, J. P. Being and Nothingness. H. E. Barnes (tr.). New York: Philosophical Library, 1956. (Originally published in French in 1943.)
Sartre, J. P. “Existentialism and Humanism.” B. Frechtman (tr.). 1956. Reprinted in Ways of Wisdom. S. Smith (ed.). Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1983: 234-43.
Schlick, M. 1927. “On the Meaning of Life.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life: A Reader, 3rd Ed., E. D. Klemke & S. Cahn (eds.). P. Heath (tr.). New York: Oxford University Press, 2008: 62-71. (Originally published in 1927.)
Schopenhauer, A. 1840. On the Basis of Morality. (available free online and in several editions)
Schopenhauer, A. “On the Suffering of the World.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 41-50. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On the Vanity of Existence.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 51-54. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On Affirmation and Denial of the Will to Live.” in Essays and Aphorism., R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 61-65. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On Suicide.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 77-79. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer: The Wisdom of Life. T. B. Saunders (tr.). 1860. rpr. in The Project Gutenberg EBook of The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer, 2004.
Schopenhauer, A. The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer: On Human Nature. T. B. Saunders (tr.). 1860. Reprinted in The Project Gutenberg EBook of The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer, 2004,
Schopenhauer, A. The World as Will and Representation. 2 Vols. E. F. J. Payne (tr.). 1969. New York: Dover Publications. (Vol. 1 first appeared in 1818, Vol. 2 in 1844, in German.)
Schopenhauer, A. Essays and Aphorisms, R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). 1970. New York: Penguin Books. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Seachris, J., 2012, “Meaning of Life: The Analytic Perspective,” The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy,
Smith, S., (ed.), 1983, Ways of Wisdom: Readings on the Good Life, Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
Tagore, R., 1961, The Religion of Man, London: George Allen & Unwin Co., Reprinted Boston: Beacon Press. (Originally published in 1930.)
Taylor, R., 1970, “The Meaning of Life,” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life, E. D. Klemke (ed.), New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 141-150.
Tolstoy, L., 2005, A Confession, Aylmer Maude (tr.), Reprinted Mineola, NY: Dover Publications. (Originally published in 1884.)
Young, J. 2014, The Death of God and the Meaning of Life, 2nd ed., New York & London: Routledge.

Author Information

Wendell O’Brien
Email: w.obrien@moreheadstate.edu
Morehead State University
U. S. A.

Kant: Philosophy of Mind

Table of Contents

1. Kant’s Theory of Cognition

a. Mental Faculties and Mental Representation

i. Sensibility, Understanding, and Reason

ii. Imagination and Judgment

b. Mental Processing

2. Consciousness

a. Phenomenal Consciousness

b. Discrimination and Differentiation

c. Self-Consciousness

i. Inner Sense

ii. Apperception

d. Unity of Consciousness and the Categories

3. Concepts and Perception

a. Content and Correctness

b. Conceptual Content

c. Conceptualism and Synthesis

d. Objections to Conceptualism

4. Rational Psychology and Self-Knowledge

a. Substantiality (A348-51/B410-11)

b. Simplicity (A351-61/B407-8)

c. Numerical Identity (A361-66/B408)

d. Relation to Objects in Space (A366-80/B409)

i. The Immediacy Argument

ii. The Argument from Imagination

e. Lessons of the Paralogisms

5. Summary

6. References and Further Reading

a. Kant’s Works in English

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

Lucius Annaeus Seneca (c. 4 B.C.E.—65 C.E.)

Table of Contents

1. Life, Political Career, and Death

2. Works and Thought

a. Seneca and Stoicism

b. Philosophical Substance and Literary Talent

c. The Letters to Lucilius

d. Anger, Grief, and the Therapy of Emotions

e. Natural Philosophy

f. Non-philosophical Works

g. Criticism and Influence

3. References and Further Reading

a. Texts and Translations

b. Secondary Literature

Author Information

Religious Disagreement

Table of Contents

1. The First-Order and Higher-Order Significance of Religious Disagreement

2. The Conciliatory Argument for the Higher-Order Defeat of Religious Belief

a. Strong Conciliatory Policies

b. Modest Conciliatory Policies

c. The a Posteriori Stage of the Argument

d. The Scope of the Conciliatory Argument

3. Permissivist Responses to the Conciliatory Argument

4. Religious Belief and the Problem of Judging Epistemic Credentials

5. Fundamental Versus Superficial Disagreements

6. Appeals to Religious Experience

7. Faith and Practical Responses to the Problem of Religious Disagreement

8. Conclusion

9. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Karl Rahner (1904-1984)

Table of Contents

1. Life

2. Influences

a. Kant

b. Rousselot

c. Maréchal

d. Heidegger

e. Summary

3. Rahner’s System

a. Geist in Welt

b. Hšrers des Wortes

4. Summary

5. References and Further Reading

a. Karl Rahner: Primary

b. Karl Rahner: Secondary

c. Immanuel Kant: Primary