Donald Davidson: Philosophy of Language

Donald Davidson (1917-2003) was one of the most influential analytic philosophers of language during the second half of the twentieth century and the first decade of the twenty-first century. An attraction of Davidson’s philosophy of language is the set of conceptual connections he draws between traditional questions about language and issues that arise in other fields of philosophy, including especially the philosophy of mind, action theory, epistemology, and metaphysics. This article addresses only his work on the philosophy of language, but one should bear in mind that this work is properly understood as part of a larger philosophical endeavor.

It is useful to think of Davidson’s project in the philosophy of language as cleaving into two parts. The first, which commences with his earliest publications in the field (Davidson 1965 and 1967), explores and defends his claim that a Tarski-style theory of truth for a language L, modified and supplemented in important ways, suffices to explain how the meanings of the sentences of a language L depend upon the meanings of words of L, and thus models a significant part of the knowledge someone possesses when she understands L. In other words, Davidson claims that we can adapt a Tarski-style theory of truth to do duty for a theory of meaning. This claim, which is stronger and more complex than it appears at first reading, is examined in section 1.

The second part of Davidson’s work on language (in articles beginning with Davidson 1973 and 1974) addresses issues associated with constructing the sort of meaning theory he proposes in the first part of his project. A Davidsonian theory of meaning is an empirical theory that one constructs to interpret─that is, to describe, systematize, and explain─the linguistic behavior of speakers one encounters in the field or, simply, in line at the supermarket. Again, this problem turns out to be more complex and more interesting than it first appears. This set of issues is examined in section 2.

Davidson’s Theory of Meaning
Davidson’s Theory of Interpretation
References and Further Reading

1. Davidson’s Theory of Meaning

Davidson takes the notion of a theory of meaning as central, so it is important to be clear at the outset what he means by the term. Starting with what he does not mean, it is no part of his project to define the concept of meaning in the sense in which Socrates asks Euthyphro to define piety. Davidson writes that it is folly to try to define the concept of truth (Davidson, 1996), and the same holds for the closely related concept of meaning: both belong to a cluster of concepts so elementary that we should not expect there to be simpler or more basic concepts in terms of which they could be definitionally reduced. Nor does Davidson ask about meaning in such a way that we would expect his answer to take the form,

the meanings of a speaker’s words are such-and-suches.

Locke, who says that meanings of a speaker’s words are ideas in her mind, has a theory of meaning in this sense, as do contemporary philosophers of language who identify meanings with the contents of certain beliefs or intentions of the speaker.

Davidson, therefore, pursues neither a theory of what meaning is nor a theory of what meanings are. Rather, for Davidson a theory of meaning is a descriptive semantics that shows how to pair a speaker’s statements with their meanings, and it does this by displaying how semantical properties or values are distributed systematically over the expressions of her language; in short, it shows how to construct the meanings of a speaker’s sentences out of the meanings of their parts and how those parts are assembled. As a first approximation, one can think of a Davidsonian theory of meaning for the language L as a set of axioms that assign meanings to the lexical elements of the language and which, together with rules for constructing complex expressions of L, imply theorems of the form,

(M) S means m,

for each sentence S of the language and m its meaning. If an observer of A’s linguistic behavior has such an “M-theorem” for each of his sentences, then she can explain and even make predictions about S‘s behavior; conversely, we can think of the M-theorems as expressing a body of linguistic knowledge that A possesses and which underwrites his linguistic competence.

a. Constraints on a Theory of Meaning

Much of the interest and originality of Davidson’s work on theories of meaning comes from his choice of Tarski-style theories of truth to serve as the model for theories of meaning. This choice is not obvious, though as early as 1935 Quine remarks that “in point of meaning… a word may be said to be determined to whatever extent the truth or falsehood of its contexts is determined” (Quine 1935, p. 89); it is not obvious since meaning is a richer concept than truth, for example, “snow is white” and “grass is green” agree in both being true, but they differ in meaning. As Davidson sees the matter, though, only theories of truth satisfy certain reasonable constraints on an adequate theory of meaning.

i. Compositionality

The first of these constraints is that a theory of meaning should be compositional. The motivation here is the observation that speakers are finitely endowed creatures, yet they can understand indefinitely many sentences; for example, you never before heard or read the first sentence of this article, but, presumably, you had no difficulty understanding it. To explain this phenomenon, Davidson reasons that language must possess some sort of recursive structure. (A structure is recursive if it is built up by repeatedly applying one of a set of procedures to a result of having applied one of those procedures, starting from one or more base elements.) For unless we can treat the meaning of every sentence of a language L as the result of a speaker’s or interpreter’s performing a finite number of operations on a finite (though extendable) semantical base, L will be unlearnable and uninterpretable: no matter how many sentences I master, there will always be others I do not understand. Conversely, if the meaning of each sentence is a product of the meanings of its parts together with the ways those parts are combined, then we can see “how an infinite aptitude can be encompassed by finite accomplishments” (Davidson 1965, p. 8). If every simple sentence of English results from applying a rule to a collection of lexical elements, for example, Combine a noun phrase and an intransitive verb (“Socrates” + “sits” ⇒ “Socrates sits”); and if every complex sentence results from applying a rule to sentences of English, such as Combine two sentences with a conjunction (“Socrates sits” + “Plato stands” ⇒ “Socrates sits and Plato stands”), then although human beings have finite cognitive capacities they can understand indefinitely many sentences. (“Socrates sits,” “Socrates sits and Plato stands,” “Socrates sits and Plato stands and Aristotle swims,” and so forth.)

This, then, gives us the requirement that a theory of meaning be compositional in the sense that it shows how the meanings of complex expressions are systematically “composed” from the meanings of simpler expressions together with a list of their modes of significant combination.

ii. No Meaning Entities

Davidson’s second adequacy constraint on a theory of meaning is that it avoid assigning objects (for example, ideas, universals, or intensions) to linguistic expressions as their meanings. In making this demand, Davidson does not stray into a theory of what meanings are; his point, rather, is that “the one thing meanings do not seem to do is oil the wheels of a theory of meaning… My objections to meanings in the theory of meaning is that… they have no demonstrated use” (Davidson 1967, p. 20).

To see this, consider that traditional logicians and grammarians divided a sentence into a subject term and a predicate term, for example, “Socrates sits” into the subject term “Socrates” and the predicate term “sits,” and assigned to the former as its meaning a certain object, the man Socrates, and to the latter a different sort of object, the universal Sitting, as its meaning. This leaves obscure, however, how the terms “Socrates” and “sits,” or the things Socrates and Sitting, combine to form a proposition, as opposed to, say, the terms “Socrates” and “Plato” (or the objects Socrates and Plato) which cannot combine to form a proposition. It also leaves obscure what role the copula “is” plays in sentences such as “Socrates is wise.” Does “is” refer to a third object that somehow “binds” Socrates to Wisdom? But how does this work? Or does “is” represent some relation? But what relation?

One might solve these difficulties faced by traditional accounts by assigning to different types of expressions different types of entities as their meanings, where these types differ in ways that make the entities amenable to combining in patterns that mirror the ways their corresponding expressions combine. If we read Frege as a Platonist, then his mature semantics is such a theory, since it divides expressions and their meanings, or Bedeutungen, into two types: “saturated” or “complete” expressions and meanings, and “unsaturated” or “incomplete” expressions and their meanings (see, for example, Frege, 1891). The proper noun “Annette” is an expression of the first type, and it means a particular object of the first type, the woman Annette; while the function expression “the father of ( )” belongs to the second type and means a certain nonspatiotemporal entity of the second type, namely, the function that maps objects to their fathers. (The open parentheses marks the argument place of the function expression, which is to be filled with a saturated expression such as “Annette,” and it lines up with a corresponding empty position in the function itself.) There is also the semantical rule that filling the parentheses of the expression, “the father of ( ),” yields a complete expression that means the father of whomever is meant by the saturated expression that fills the parentheses: Annette’s father if “Annette” fills the parentheses, Annette’s father’s father if “the father of Annette” fills the parentheses, and so forth. But now one has to ask, what is the point of our having said that the expression, “the father of ( )” means a certain entity? All the work is being done by the rule we have formulated, and none by the ontology.

There are other methodological considerations that lie behind Davidson’s hostility toward doing semantics by assigning objects and other sorts of entities to words as their meanings. People acquire a language by observing the situated behavior of other people, that is, by observing other people speaking about objects and occurrences in their shared environment; in turn, when they speak, what they mean by their words generally reflects the causes that prompt them to utter those words. These causes are usually mundane sorts of natural things and events, such as other people, grass, people mowing the grass, and the like. This picture of meaning is vague, but it suggests that the psychological achievement of understanding or being able to produce a sentence like “grass is green” rests on the same (or very nearly the same) natural abilities as knowing that grass is green; and it suggests to Davidson that theories of meaning should eschew the esoteric objects and relations that many contemporary philosophies of language presuppose, such as intensions, possible worlds, transworld identity relations, and so forth. By avoiding such things, Davidson positions theories of meaning more closely to the epistemology of linguistic understanding, in the sense of an account of the way that a speaker’s actions and other events are evidence for an interpreter’s attributing meaning to the speaker’s words.

b. Theories of Truth as Theories of Meaning

To begin to see what a Davidsonian theory of meaning looks like, recall schema M,

(M) S means m,

where sentence S belongs to language L and m is its meaning. Recasting this in a more instructive version,

(M′) S means that p,

we replace “m” in schema M by the schematic variable “p” in schema M′. In the latter, the schema is filled out by replacing “p” with a sentence in the interpreter’s background or metalanguage that translates the target or object language sentence S. For example, a theory of meaning for German constructed by an English-speaking interpreter might include as an instance of schema M′ the theorem,

“Schnee ist weiss” means that snow is white,

where “Schnee ist weiss” replaces “S” and “snow is white” replaces “p.”

Now, schema M′ is more instructive than its predecessor because while the “m” in schema M names an object that S means – in violation of Davidson’s second constraint – the expression “p” holds the place for a sentence (for example, “snow is white”) that the interpreter uses to “track” the meaning of S (“Schnee ist weiss”) without reifying that meaning, that is, without treating that meaning as an object. The sentence that replaces “p” tracks the meaning of S in the sense that schema M′ correlates S (again, “Schnee ist weiss”) with the extra-linguistic condition that p (that snow is white) which the interpreter describes using her own sentence (“snow is white.”)

Schema M′ points the way forward, but we are not there yet. Davidson is not really interested in constructing theories of meaning in the sense of filling out schema M′ for every sentence of German or Urdu; rather, he theorizes about constructing theories of meaning to gain insight into the concept of meaning. And in this regard, schema M′ comes up short: it relies on the relation “means that” which is essentially synonymy across languages, which is as much in need of explication as meaning itself. What Davidson is really interested in is giving an explication, in Carnap’s sense (Carnap 1947, pp. 7-8), of an obscure explanandum, meaning, using a clear and exact explanans, and he finds his explanans in Tarski’s semantic theory of truth.

The semantic theory of truth is not a metaphysical theory of truth in the way that the correspondence theory of truth is. That is, the semantic theory of truth does not tell us what truth is, rather, it defines a predicate that applies to all and only the true sentences of a specified language (technically, true-in-L) by showing how the truth-conditions of a sentence of the language depend on the sentence’s internal structure and certain properties of its parts. This should sound familiar: roughly, the semantic theory of truth does for truth what Davidson wishes to do for meaning. Therefore, Davidson replaces schema M′ with Tarski’s schema T:

(T) S is true if and only if p.

Schema T sits at the center of Tarski’s project. A formally adequate (that is, internally consistent) definition of truth for a language L is, in addition, materially adequate if it applies to all and only the true sentences of L; Tarski shows that an axiomatic theory θ meets this condition if it satisfies what he calls Convention T, which requires that θ entail for each sentence S of L an instance of schema T. The idea is that the axioms of θ supply both interpretations for the parts of S, for example,

(A.i) “Schnee” means snow,

and

(A.ii) an object a satisfies the German expression “x ist weiss” if and only if a is white,

and rules for forming complex German expressions from simpler ones, such as that

(A.iii) “Schnee” + “x ist weiss” ⇒ “Schnee ist weiss,”

Together these axioms imply instances of schema T, for example,

“Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if snow is white.

More precisely, an internally consistent theory of truth θ for a language L meets Convention T if it implies for each S of L an instance of schema T in which “p” is replaced by a sentence from the metalanguage that translates S. Clearly, such a theory will “get it right” in the sense that the T-sentences (that is, the instances of schema T) that θ implies do state truth conditions for the sentences of the object language.

Now, Davidson’s claim is not that a Tarski-style theory of truth in itself is a theory of meaning; in particular, he remarks that a T-sentence cannot be equated with a statement of a sentence’s meaning. At best, a Tarski-style theory of truth is a part of a theory of meaning, with additional resources being brought into play.

c. Meaning and Truth

Notice that Tarski’s Convention T employs the notion of translation, or synonymy across languages, and so a Tarski-style theory of truth cannot, as it stands, supply the explanans Davidson seeks. The underlying point, which Davidson acknowledges “only gradually dawned on me” (1984, p. xiv), is that Tarski analyzes the concept of truth in terms of the concept of meaning (or synonymy), while Davidson’s project depends on making the opposite move: he explains the notion of meaning in terms of truth.

Davidson, therefore, dispenses with translation and rewrites Convention T to require that

an acceptable theory of truth must entail, for every sentence s of the object language, a sentence of the form: s is true if and only if p, where “p” is replaced by any sentence that is true if and only if s is. Given this formulation, the theory is tested by the evidence that T-sentences are simply true; we have given up the idea that we must also tell whether what replaces ‘p’ translates s. (Davidson 1973, p. 134)

Thus, where Tarski requires that “p” translate S, Davidson substitutes the much weaker criterion that the T-sentences “are simply true.”

But Davidson’s weakened Convention T is open to the following objection. Suppose there is a theory of truth for German, θ₁, that entails the T-sentence,

(T₁) “Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if snow is white.

Suppose, further, that there is a second theory of truth for German, θ₂, that is just like θ₁ except that in place of (T₁) it entails the T-sentence,

(T₂) “Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if grass is green.

A theory of truth that entails (T₂) is clearly false, but θ₁ satisfies Davidson’s revised Convention T if and only if θ₂ also satisfies it.

Here is why. The sentences “snow is white” and “grass is green” both happen to be true, and hence the two sentences are materially equivalent, that is,

Snow is white if and only if grass is green.

(Sentences are materially equivalent if they contingently have the same truth-value; sentences are logically equivalent if they necessarily have the same truth-value.) But since they are materially equivalent, it turns out that:

(T₁) is true if and only if (T₂) is true.

Therefore, all the T-sentences of θ₁ are true if and only if all the T-sentences of θ₂are true, and thus θ₁ satisfies Davidson’s revised Convention T if and only if θ₂does. The root of this problem is that when it comes to distinguishing between sentences, truth is too coarse a filter to distinguish between materially equivalent sentences with different meanings.

Davidson has a number of responses to this objection (in Davidson 1975). He points out that someone who knows that θ is a materially adequate theory of truth for a language L knows more than that its T-sentences are true. She knows the axioms of θ, which assign meaning to the lexical elements of L, the words and simple expressions out of which complex expressions and whole sentences are composed; and she knows that these axioms imply the T-sentence correlations between object language sentences (“Schnee ist weiss”) and their interpreting conditions (that snow is white). Thus, someone who knows that θ is a materially adequate theory of truth for a language L knows a systematic procedure for assigning to the sentences of L their truth-conditions, making one’s grasp of a theory of truth-cum-meaning a holistic affair: knowing the T-sentence for any one object language sentence is tied to knowing the T-sentences for many object language sentences. (For example, knowing that “‘Schnee ist die Farbe der Wolken” is true if and only if snow is the color of clouds, and that “Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if snow is white, is tied to knowing that “Wolken sind weiss” is true if and only if clouds are white.) In this way, although Davidson’s version of Convention T — stated in terms of truth rather than translation — does not prima facie filter out theories like θ₂, such theories will raise red flags as deviant assignments (such as grass to “Schnee”) ramify through the language and interpreters consider the evidence of speakers pointing to snow and uttering, “Das ist Schnee!”

It matters, too, that the T-sentences of a Davidsonian theory of truth-cum-meaning are laws of an empirical theory and not mere accidental generalizations. The important difference here is that as empirical laws and not simple statements of chance correlations, T-sentences support counterfactual inferences: just as it is true that a certain rock would have fallen at 32 ft/sec² if it had been dropped, even if it was not, it is also true that a German speaker’s utterance of “Schnee ist weiss” would be true if and only if snow is white, even in a world where snow is not white. (But in a world where grass is green, and snow is not white, it is not the case that a German speaker’s utterance of “Schnee ist weiss” would be true if and only if grass is green.)

This means that there is a logically “tighter” connection between the left- and right-hand sides of the T-sentences of materially adequate theories. This logically “tighter” connection underwrites the role that T-sentences have in constructing explanations of speakers’ behavior and, in turn, is a product of the nature of the evidence interpreters employ in constructing Davidsonian theories of truth-cum-meaning. An interpreter witnesses German speakers uttering “Schnee ist weiss!” while indicating freshly fallen snow; the interpreter singles out snow’s being white as the salient feature of the speaker’s environment; and she infers that snow’s being white causes him to hold the sentence, ‘Schnee ist weiss!,” true. Thus, the connection between snow’s being white and the T-sentence is more than a chance correlation, and this gets expressed by there being something stronger than an extensional relation between a statement of the evidence and the theory.

This has often been taken to be a fatal concession, inasmuch as Davidson is understood to be committed to giving an extensional account of the knowledge someone possesses when she understands a language. However, Davidson denies that he is committed to giving an extensional account of an interpreter’s knowledge; all he is after is formulating the theory of truth-cum-meaning itself in extensional terms, and he allows that ancillary knowledge about that theory may involve concepts or relations that cannot be expressed in extensionalist terms. Thus, it is not an objection to his project that an interpreter’s background logic, for example, in her understanding of her own theory, should involve appeal to intensional notions.

d. Formal and Natural Languages

Tarski restricts his attention to investigating the semantical properties of formal languages, whereas Davidson’s interest lies in the investigation of natural languages. Formal languages are well-behaved mathematical objects whose structures can be exactly and exhaustively described in purely syntactical terms, while natural languages are anything but well-behaved. They are plastic and subject to ambiguity, and they contain myriad linguistic forms that resist, to one degree or another, incorporation into a theory of truth via the methods available to the logical semanticist. Davidson has written on the problems posed by several of these linguistic forms (in Davidson 1967a, 1968, 1978, and 1979) including indexicals, adverbial modifiers, indirect discourse, metaphor, mood, and the propositional attitudes.

i. Indexicals

It is instructive to see how Davidson handles indexicals. The key insight here is that truth is properly a property of the situated production of a sentence token by a speaker at a certain time, that is, it is a property of an utterance, not a sentence. We define, therefore, an utterance to be an ordered triple consisting of a sentence token, a time, and a speaker. Truth is thus a property of such a triple, and in constructing a Tarski-style theory of truth for a language L the goal is to have it entail T-theorems such as:

“Das ist weiss” is true when spoken by x at t if and only if the object indicated by x at t is white.

This T-theorem captures two distinct indexical elements. First, the German pronoun “das” refers to the object the speaker indicates when she makes her utterance; we model its contribution to the utterance’s truth-condition by explicitly referring on the right side of the T-theorem to that object. Second, the German verb “ist” is conjugated in the present indicative tense and refers to the time the speaker performs her utterance. We represent this indexical feature by repeating the time variable “t” on both sides of the T-theorem. Not all sentences contain indexicals (“that,” “she,” “he,” “it”, “I,” “here,” “now,” “today,” and so forth, but unless it is formulated in the so-called “eternal present” (for example, “5 plus 7 is twelve”), every sentence contains an indexical element in the tense of the sentence’s main verb.

ii. Indirect Discourse

The philosophy of language is thick with proposals for treating the anomalous behavior of linguistic contexts involving intensional idioms, including especially indirect discourse and propositional attitude constructions. In such contexts, familiar substitution patterns fail; for example, it is true that

(1) The Earth moves,

and that

(2) The Earth = the planet on which D.D. was born in 1917.

By the Principle of Extensionality,

Co-referring terms can be exchanged without affecting the truth-value of contexts in which those terms occur,

we can infer that

The planet on which D.D. was born in 1917 moves.

However, if we report that Galileo said that (1), that is,

(3) Galileo said that the Earth moves,

we are blocked from making the substitution,

(4) Galileo said that the planet on which D.D. was born in 1917 moves,

for surely Galileo did not say that, since he died nearly three hundred years before D.D. was born. (2) and (3) are true, while (4) is false; hence (2) and (3) do not entail (4), and the Principle of Extensionality fails for “says that” contexts.

Davidson’s solution to this problem is as ingenious as it is controversial, for it comes at the price of some grammatical novelty. He argues that the word “that” that occurs in (3) is a demonstrative pronoun and not, as grammar books tell us, a relative pronoun; the direct object of “said” is this demonstrative, and not the subordinate noun clause “that the Earth moves.” In fact, under analysis this noun clause disappears and becomes two separate expressions: the demonstrative “that,” which completes the open sentence “Galileo said x,” and the grammatically independent sentence “The Earth moves.” This new sentence is the demonstrative’s referent; or, rather, its referent is the speaker’s utterance of the sentence, “The Earth moves,” which follows her utterance of the sentence “Galileo said that.” Thus Davidson proposes that from a logical point of view, (3) is composed of two separate utterances:

(5) Galileo said that. The Earth moves.

In other words, the grammatical connection between “The Earth moves” and “Galileo said that” is severed and replaced by the same relationship that connects snow and my pointing to snow and saying “That is white.”

More properly, (5) should be:

(6) Galileo said something that meant the same as my next utterance. The Earth moves.

This qualification is needed, since the utterance to which “that” refers in (5) is my utterance of a sentence in my language, which I use to report an utterance Galileo made in his language. As Davidson sometimes puts it, Galileo and I are samesayers: what he and I mean, when he performs his utterance and I perform mine, is the same. Finally, a careful semantical analysis of (6) should look something like this:

(7) There exists some utterance x performed by Galileo, and x means the same in Galileo’s idiolect as my next utterance means in mine. The Earth moves.

Now in my utterance, “the Earth” can be exchanged for “the planet on which D.D. was born in 1917” because as I use them both expressions refer to the same object, namely, the Earth. Thus, the Principle of Extensionality is preserved.

Davidson proposes that this account can be extended to treat other opaque constructions in the object language, such as the propositional attitudes (Davidson 1975) and entailment relations (Davidson 1976). Looking at the former, the idea is that by analogy with (3), (5), and (6),

(8) Galileo believed that the Earth moves,

should be glossed as

(9) Galileo believed that. The Earth moves,

or, better,

(10) Galileo believed something that had the same content meant as my next utterance. The Earth moves.

A question, then, is what is this something that Galileo believed? In the analysis of indirect discourse, my sentence (“The Earth moves”) tracks an actual utterance of Galileo’s (“Si muove”), but Galileo had many beliefs he never expressed verbally; so it cannot be an utterance of Galileo’s. Alternatively, one might treat thoughts as inner mental representations and belief as a relation between thinkers and thoughts so conceived; then what has the same content as my utterance of my sentence, “The Earth moves,” is Galileo’s mental representation in his language of thought. However, Davidson argues elsewhere (Davidson 1989) that believing is not a relation between thinker and mental objects; this point is important to the position he stakes out in the internalism/externalism debate in the philosophy of mind.

Instead, Davidson proposes (in Davidson 1975) that (3) is to (6) as (8) is to:

(11) Galileo would be honestly speaking his mind were he to say something that had the same content as my next utterance. The Earth moves.

Galileo never actually said something that means the same as my sentence, “The Earth moves,” but had he spoken his mind about the matter, he would have. (Historically, of course, Galileo did say such a thing, but let us suppose that he did not.) This analysis, however, imports a counterfactual condition into the T-sentences of an interpreter’s theory for Galileo’s words and thoughts, which Davidson wants to avoid. Finally, in the same article Davidson seems to suggest that we treat Galileo’s thought more directly as a “belief state,” which might be glossed as:

(12) Galileo was in some belief state that had the same content meant as my next utterance. The Earth moves.

Intuitively, this seems right: what I track with my utterance is precisely the content of Galileo’s belief. This leaves open, however, what “belief states” are such that they can be quantified over (as in (10)) and have contents that can be tracked by utterances. This, though, is a problem for the philosophy of mind rather than the philosophy of language, and there is no reason to suppose that it affects Davidson’s proposal more than other accounts of the semantics of the propositional attitudes.

2. Davidson’s Theory of Interpretation

Consideration of the exigencies of interpreting a person’s speech behavior yields additional constraints on theories of truth-cum-meaning, and it also provides deep insights into the nature of language and meaning. Davidson examines interpretation and the construction of theories of meaning by drawing extensively on the work of his mentor, W. V. Quine.

a. Radical Translation

In Quine’s famous thought experiment of radical translation, we imagine a “field linguist” who observes the verbal behavior of speakers of a foreign language, and we reflect on her task of constructing a translation manual that maps the speakers’ language onto her own. The translation task is radical in the sense that Quine assumes she has no prior knowledge whatsoever of the speakers’ language or its relation to her home language. Hence her only evidence for constructing and testing her translation manual are her observations of the speakers’ behavior and their relation to their environment.

The linguist’s entering wedge into a foreign language are those of the speakers’ utterances that seem to bear directly on conspicuous features of the situation she shares with her subject. Taking Quine’s well-known example, suppose a rabbit scurries within the field of view of both the linguist and an alien speaker, who then utters, “Gavagai!” With this as her initial evidence, the linguist sifts through the features of the complex situation that embeds his speech behavior; she reasons that were she in the subject’s position of seeing a rabbit, she would be disposed to assert, “Lo, a rabbit!” Supposing, then, that the alien speaker’s verbal dispositions relate to his environment as her verbal disposition are related to her own, she tentatively translates “Gavagai!” with her own sentence, “Lo, a rabbit!”

b. Radical Interpretation

Taking his inspiration from Quine, Davidson holds that a radical interpreter thus begins with observations such as:

(13) A belongs to a community of speakers of a common language, call it K, and he holds “Gavagai!” true on Saturday at noon, and there is a rabbit visible to A on Saturday at noon,

and eliciting additional evidence from observing K-speakers’ situated verbal behavior, she infers that

(14) If x is a K-speaker, then x holds “Gavagai!” true at t if and only if there is a rabbit visible to x at t.

This inference is subject to the vagaries that attend empirical research, but having gathered an adequate sample of instances of K-speakers holding “Gavagai” true when and only when rabbits cross their paths, she takes (14) to be confirmed. In turn, then, she takes (14) as support that (partly) confirms the following T-sentence of a Tarski-style truth theory for K:

(15) “Gavagai!” is true when spoken by x at t if and only there is a rabbit visible to x at t.

Note that in reconstructing the language K, Davidson’s linguist does not mention sentences of her home language. Of course, she uses her own sentences in making these assignments, but her sentences are directed upon extra-linguistic reality. Thus, unlike a Quinean radical translator, who does mention sentences of his home language, a Davidsonian radical interpreter adopts a semantical stance: she relates speakers’ sentences to the world by assigning them objective truth conditions describing extra-linguistic situations and objects. It is in this sense that a Davidsonian linguist is an interpreter, and Davidson calls the project undertaken by his linguist the construction of a theory of interpretation.

i. Principles of Charity: Coherence

Like any empirical scientist, a Davidsonian radical interpreter relies on methodological assumptions she makes to move from her observations (13) to her intermediate conclusions (14) and to the final form of her theory (15). Davidson identifies as the radical interpreter’s two most important methodological assumptions the Principle of (Logical) Coherence and the Principle of Correspondence. Taken together these canons of interpretation are known, somewhat misleadingly, as the Principle(s) of Charity.

Since a Davidsonian theory of interpretation is modeled on a Tarski-style theory of truth, one of the first steps an interpreter takes is to look for a coherent structure in the sentences of alien speakers. She does this by assuming that a speaker’s behavior satisfies strong, normative constraints, namely, that he reasons in accordance with logical laws. Making this assumption, she can diagram the logical patterns in speakers’ verbal behavior and leverage evidence she gleans from her observations into a detailed picture of the internal structure of his language.

Assuming that a speaker reasons in accordance with logical laws is neither an empirical hypothesis about a subject’s intellectual capacities nor an expression of the interpreter’s goodwill toward her subject. Satisfying the norms of rationality is a condition on speaking a language and having thoughts, and hence failing to locate sufficient consistency in someone’s behavior means there is nothing to interpret. The assumption that someone is rational is a foundation on which the project of interpreting his utterances rests.

ii. Principles of Charity: Correspondence

The problem the radical interpreter faces is that by hypothesis she does not know what a speaker’s sentences mean, and neither does she have direct access to the contents of his propositional attitudes, such as his beliefs or desires. Both of these factors bear on making sense of his verbal behavior, however, for which sentences a speaker puts forward as true depends simultaneously on the meanings of those sentences and on his beliefs. For example, a K-speaker utters “Gavagai!” only if (α) the sentence is true if and only if a rabbit presents itself to him, and (β) he believes that a rabbit presents itself to him.

A speaker’s holding a sentence true is thus (as Davidson put it) a “vector of two forces” (Davidson 1974a, p. 196), what meanings his words have and what he believes about the world. The interpreter thus faces the problem of too many unknowns, which she solves by performing her own thought experiment: she projects herself into her subject’s shoes and assumes that he does or would believe what she, were she in his position, would believe. This solves the problem of her not knowing what the speaker believes since she knows what she would believe were she in his situation, and hence she knows what her subject does believe if he believes what she thinks he ought to believe. The Principle of Correspondence is the methodological injunction that an interpreter affirm the if-clause.

The Principle of Correspondence applies especially to speakers’ observation sentences, for example, there goes a rabbit! These are the points of immediate causal contact between the world shared by speakers and interpreters, on the one hand, and the utterances and attitudes of speakers, on the other. Where there is greater distance between cause (features of the speaker’s situation) and effect (which sentences the speaker puts forward as true), there are extra degrees of freedom in explaining how the speaker might reasonably hold true something that the interpreter believes is false.

Davidson sometimes formulates the Principle of Correspondence in terms of the interpreter’s maximizing agreement between her and the speakers she interprets, but this is misleading. An interpreter needs to fill out the contents of the speaker’s attitudes if her project is to move forward; and she does this by attributing to him those beliefs that allow her to tell the most coherent story about what he believes. Thus, she routes attributions of beliefs to the speaker through what she knows about his beliefs and values. An interpreter will still export to her subject a great deal of her own world view, but if there are grounds for attributing to him certain beliefs that she takes to be false, then she does so if what she knows about him makes it more reasonable than not. She thus makes use of whatever she knows about the speaker’s personal history and psychology.

c. Language without Conventions

Davidson typically presents radical interpretation as targeting a community’s language, but in his more careful statements he argues that the focus of interpretation is the speech behavior of a single individual over a given stretch of time (Davidson 1986). One reason for this is that Davidson denies that conventions shared by members of a linguistic community play any philosophically interesting role in an account of meaning. Shared conventions facilitate communication, but they are in principle dispensible. For so long as an audience discerns the intention behind a speaker’s utterance, for example, he intends that his utterance of “Schnee ist weiss” mean that snow is white, then his utterance means that snow is white, regardless of whether he and they share the practice that speakers use “Schnee ist weiss” to mean that snow is white. This point is implicit in the project of radical interpretation.

This implies, according to Davidson, that what we ordinarily think of as a single natural language, such as German or Urdu, is like a smooth curve drawn through the idiolects of different speakers. It also underwrites Davidson’s claim that “interpretation is domestic as well as foreign” (Davidson 1973, p. 125), that is, there is no essential difference between understanding the words spoken by radically alien speakers and our familiars; there is only the practical difference that one has more and better information about the linguistic behavior and propositional attitudes of those with whom one has more contact.

d. Indeterminacy of Interpretation

Davidson, following Quine, argues that although the methodology of radical interpretation (or translation, for Quine) winnows the field of admissible candidates, it does not identify a unique theory that best satisfies its criteria. At the end of the day there will be competing theories that are mutually inconsistent but which do equally well in making sense of a speaker’s utterance, and in this sense interpretation (and translation) is indeterminate.

Quine draws from this the skeptical conclusion that there is “no fact of the matter” when it comes to saying what speakers or their words mean. Davidson stops short of Quine’s skepticism, and he draws a different moral from the indeterminacy arguments. (In this section we emphasize Davidson’s agreements with Quine, in the following his disagreement.)

Here is how indeterminacy infects the task of the radical translator. She begins with a speaker’s situated observation sentences, and she finds her first success in correlating a sentence S_H of her home language with a sentence S_O of her subject’s language. She hypothesizes that S_H and S_O are synonymous, and this is her wedge into the speaker’s language. Next, the translator makes hypotheses about how to segment the speaker’s observation sentences into words (or morphemes) and about how to line these up with words of her own language. For example, she may identify the initial vocable of “Gavagai!,” “ga,” with the demonstrative “there” in her home language, and “gai” with the common noun “rabbit.” This permits her to puzzle out the translation of nonobservation sentences that share some of their parts with observation sentences. (In the Davidsonian version, these correlations take the form of interpretations rather than translations, but the point is the same.)

These additional hypotheses are essential to her project, but they are not backed by any direct behavioral evidence. They are confirmed just so long as the translations or interpretations they warrant are consistent with the linguist’s evidence for her evolving theory; however, that evidence has the form of information about the translation or interpretation of complete sentences. Indeterminacy arrives on the scene, then, because different sets of hypotheses and the translations or interpretations they imply do equally well in making sense of a speaker’s sentences, even though they assign different translations or interpretations to the parts of those sentences.

Indeterminacy, however, also infects the translation and interpretation of complete sentences. This is because the evidence for a translation manual or theory of interpretation does not, in fact, come at the level of sentences. The radical translator or interpreter does not test her translations or T-sentences one-by-one; rather, what goes before the tribunal of evidence is a complete translation manual or theory of interpretation for the entire language (Quine 1953). This means that in the case of sentences, too, there is slack between evidence and a translation or interpretation as the linguist may vary the translation or interpretation of a given sentence by making complementary changes elsewhere in her translation manual or theory of interpretation. Thus the interpretation of sentences as well as terms is indeterminate.

e. Meaning and Interpretation

Davidson’s response to the indeterminacy arguments is at the same time more modest and more ambitious than Quine’s. It is more modest because Davidson does not endorse the skeptical conclusion that Quine draws from the arguments that since there are no determinate meanings, there are no meanings. This reasoning is congenial to Quine’s parsimony and his behaviorism: all there is, according to Quine, are speaker’s behavior and dispositions to behave and whatever can be constructed from or explained in terms of that behavior and those dispositions.

It is more ambitious than Quine’s response insofar as Davidson offers in place of Quine’s skepticism what Hume would call a skeptical solution to the indeterminacy problem. That is, while acknowledging the validity of Quine’s argument that there are no meanings, he undertakes to reconceive the concept of meaning that figures as a premise in that reasoning (as Hume reconceives the concept of causation that figures in his skeptical arguments). There are no determinate meanings, therefore, meaning is not determinate. In place of the traditional picture of meanings as semantical quanta that speakers associate with their verbal expressions, Davidson argues that meaning is the invariant structure that is common to the competing interpretations of speakers’ behavior (Davidson 1999, p. 81). That there is such a structure is implied by holism: in assigning a certain meaning to a single utterance, an interpreter has already chosen one of a number of competing theories to interpret a speaker’s over-all language. Choosing that theory, in turn, presupposes that she has identified in the speaker’s utterances a pattern or structure she takes that theory to describe at least as well as any other. Herein lies the Indeterminacy of Interpretation, for that theory does only at least as well as any other. There is, therefore, no more an objective basis for choosing one theory of meaning over another than there is for preferring the Fahrenheit to the Celsius scale for temperature ascriptions.

This conclusion, however, has no skeptical implications, for by assumption each theory does equally well at describing the same structure. Whether there is a “fact of the matter” when it comes to saying what speakers or their sentences mean, therefore, becomes the question whether there are objective grounds for saying that that structure exists. That structure is a property of a system of events, and hence the grounds for saying that it exists are the criteria for attributing those properties to those events; the skeptical conclusion would follow, therefore, only if there were no such criteria. The argument for the Indeterminacy of Interpretation does not prove that, however. On the contrary, the methodology of radical interpretation provides a framework for attributing patterns of properties to speakers and their utterances.

As Davidson reconceives it, therefore, understanding a person’s sentences involves discerning patterns in his situated actions, but no discrete “meanings.” An interpreter makes sense of her interlocutor by treating him as a rational agent and reflecting on the contents of her own propositional attitudes, and she tracks what his sentences mean with her own sentences. This project may fail in practice, especially where the interpretation is genuinely radical and there is moral as well as linguistic distance separating an interpreter and a speaker; but in principle there is no linguistic behavior that cannot be interpreted, that is, understood, by another. If an interpreter can discern a pattern in a creature’s situated linguistic behavior, then she can make sense of his words; alternatively, if she cannot interpret his utterances, then she has no grounds for attributing meaning to the sounds he produces nor evidence to support the hypothesis that he is a rational agent. These observations are not a statement of linguistic imperialism; rather, they are implications of the methodology of interpretation and the role that Tarski-style theories of truth-cum-meaning play in the enterprise. Meaning is essentially intersubjective.

Further, meaning is objective in the sense that most of what speakers say about the world is true of the world. Some critics object that this statement rests on an optimistic assessment of human capacities for judgment; however, Davidson’s point is not an empirical claim that could turn out to be mistaken. Rather, it is a statement of the methodology of radical interpretation, an assumption an interpreter makes to gain access to her subject’s language. Her only path into his language is by way of the world they share since she makes sense of his sentences by discerning patterns in the relations between those sentences and the objects and events in the world that cause him to hold those sentences true. If too many of his utterances are false, then the link between what he says and thinks, on the one hand, and the world, on the other, is severed; and the enterprise of interpretation halts. Finding too much unexplainable error in his statements about the world, therefore, is not an option, if she is going to interpret him.

3. References and Further Reading

a. Anthologies of Davidson’s Writings

Davidson, Donald. 1984. Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation. New York: Oxford University Press. [Cited as ITI]
Davidson, Donald. 2001. Essays on Actions and Events. Oxford University Press. [Cited as EAE]
Davidson, Donald. 2001. Subjective, Intersubjective, Objective. New York: Oxford University Press. [Cited as SIO]
Davidson, Donald. 2005. Truth, Language, and History. New York: Oxford University Press. [Cited as TLH]
Davidson, Donald. 2005A. Truth and Predication. Boston: Harvard University Press.
- Contains the texts of Davidson’s 1989 Dewey Lectures (given at Columbia University) on the concept of truth together with his 2001 Hermes Lectures (given at the University of Perugia). The first half is useful in understanding the role truth plays in his systematic philosophy, and the second half contains Davidson’s interesting criticisms of his predecessors, ranging from Plato to Quine.

b. Individual Articles by Davidson

Davidson, Donald. 1965. “Theories of Meaning and Learnable Languages,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1967. “Truth and Meaning,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1967a. “The Logical Form of Action Sentences,” reprinted in EAE.
Davidson, Donald. 1968. “On Saying That,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1973. “Radical Interpretation,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1974. “Belief and the Basis of Meaning,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1974a. “On the Very Idea of a Conceptual Scheme,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1975. “Thought and Talk,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1976. “Reply to Foster,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1978. “What Metaphors Mean,” reprinted in ITI.
Davidson, Donald. 1986. “A Nice Derangement of Epitaphs,” reprinted in TLH.
Davidson, Donald. 1989. “What is Present to the Mind?”, reprinted in SIO.
Davidson, Donald. 1996. “The Folly of Trying to Define Truth,” reprinted in TLH.
Davidson, Donald. 1999. “Reply to W.V. Quine,” printed in Hahn 1999.

c. Primary Works by other Authors

Carnap, Rudolf. 1947., Meaning and Necessity, 2nd ed. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Frege, Gottlob. 1891. “Funktion und Begriff,” translated as “Function and Concept” and reprinted in Brian McGuinness et al. (eds.), Collected Papers on Mathematics, Logic, and Philosophy, 1984. New York: Basil Blackwell.
Quine, W.V. 1935. “Truth by Convention,” reprinted in The Ways of Paradox, 1976. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.

d. Secondary Sources

i. Anthologies

De Caro, Marion. 1999. Interpretations and Causes: New Perspectives on Donald Davidson’s Philosophy. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
- Articles by an internationally diverse range of authors focusing on the interplay between the notions of interpretation and causation in Davidson’s philosophy.
Dasenbrock, Reed Way. 1993. Literary Theory After Davidson. University Park: Penn State Press.
- Articles addressing the significance of Davidson’s philosophy of language for literary theory.
Hahn, Edwin Lewis. 1999. The Philosophy of Donald Davidson. The Library of Living Philosophers, volume XXVII. Peru, IL: Open Court Publishing Company.
- A useful collection of articles, including Davidson’s intellectual autobiography and his replies to authors.
Kotatko, Petr, Pagin, Peter and Segal, Gabriel. 2001. Interpreting Davidson. Stanford, CA: Center for the Study of Language and Information Publications.
Lepore, Ernest. 1986. Truth and Interpretation: Perspectives on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- An excellent collection of articles addressing a range of topics in Davidson’s philosophy of language.
Stoecker, Ralf. 1993. Reflecting Davidson: Donald Davidson Responding to an International Forum of Philosophers. Berlin: de Gruyter.

ii. Critical Discussions of Davidson’s Philosophy

Evnine, Simon. 1991. Donald Davidson. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
Joseph, Marc. 2004. Donald Davidson. Montreal: McGill-Queens University Press.
Lepore, Ernest, and Ludwig, Kirk. 2005. Davidson: Meaning, Truth, Language, and Reality. New York: Oxford University Press.
Lepore, Ernest, and Ludwig, Kirk. 2009. Donald Davidson’s Truth-Theoretic Semantics. New York: Oxford University Press.
- A detailed and technical examination of Davidson’s use of Tarski-style theories of truth in his semantical project.
Ramberg, Bjørn. 1989. Donald Davidson’s Philosophy of Language. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.

Author Information

Marc A. Joseph
Email: majoseph@mills.edu
Mills College
U. S. A.

Immanuel Kant: Philosophy of Religion

kant2 Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) focused on elements of the philosophy of religion for about half a century─from the mid-1750s, when he started teaching philosophy, until after his retirement from academia. Having been reared in a distinctively religious environment, he remained concerned about the place of religious belief in human thought and action. As he moved towards the development of his own original philosophical system in his pre-critical period through the years in which he was writing each Critique and subsequent works all the way to the incomplete, fragmentary Opus Postumum of his old age, his attention to religious faith was an enduring theme. His discussions of God and religion represent a measure of the evolution of his philosophical worldview. This began with his pre-critical advocacy of the rationalism in which he was educated. Then this got subjected to the systematic critique that would open the doors to his own unique critical treatment. Finally, at the end of his life, he seemed to experiment with a more radical approach. As we follow the trajectory of this development, we see Kant moving from confidently advocating a demonstrative argument for the God of metaphysics to denying all theoretical knowledge of a theological sort, to affirming a moral argument establishing religious belief as rational, to suspicions regarding religion divorced from morality, and finally to hints of an idea of God so identified with moral duty as to be immanent rather than transcendent. The key text representing the revolutionary move from his pre-critical, rationalistic Christian orthodoxy to his critical position (that could later lead to those suggestions of heterodox religious belief) is his seminal Critique of Pure Reason. In the preface to its second edition, in one of the most famous sentences he ever wrote, he sets the theme for this radical transition by writing, “I have therefore found it necessary to deny knowledge, in order to make room for faith” (Critique, B). Though never a skeptic (for example, he was always committed to scientific knowledge), Kant came to limit knowledge to objects of possible experience and to regard ideas of metaphysics (including theology) as matters of rational faith.

Kant and Religion
God in Some Pre-critical Writings
Each Critique as Pivotal
The Prolegomena and Kant’s Lectures
1. The Prolegomena
2. Kant’s Lectures
Other Important Works
His Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone
Some Tantalizing Suggestions from the Opus Postumum
References and Further Readings
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Kant and Religion

This article does not present a full biography of Kant. A more general account of his life can be found in the article Kant’s Aesthetics. But five matters should be briefly addressed as background for discussing his philosophical theology: (1) his association with Pietism; (2) his wish to strike a reasonable balance between (the Christian) religion and (Newtonian physical) science; (3) his attempt to steer a middle path between the excesses of dogmatic modern rationalism and skeptical modern empiricism; (4) his commitment to the Enlightenment ideals; and (5) his unpleasant encounter with the Prussian censor over his religious writings.

Kant was born, raised, educated, worked, lived, and died in Königsberg (now Kaliningrad, part of Russia), the capital city of East Prussia. His parents followed the Pietist movement in German Lutheranism, as he was brought up to do. Pietism stressed studying the scriptures as a basis for personal devotion, lay governance of the church, the conscientious practice of Christian ethics, religious education emphasizing the development and exercising of values, and preaching designed to inculcate and promote piety in its adherents. At the age of eight, the boy was sent to a Pietist school directed by his family’s pastor. Eight years later, he enrolled in the University of Königsberg, where he came under the influence of a Pietist professor of logic and metaphysics. Even during later decades of his life, when he ceased to practice religion publicly (see letter to Lavater in Correspondence, pp. 152-154) and found external displays of pious devotion distasteful, his thought and values continued to be influenced by the Pietism of his earlier years.

Second, as a university student, Kant became a follower of Newtonian science. The dissertation for his graduate degree was more what we would consider physics than philosophy, although in those days it was called “natural philosophy.” Many of his earliest writings were in Newtonian science, including his Universal Natural History and Theory of the Heavens of 1755 (in Cosmogony), dedicated to his king, Frederick the Great, and propounding a nebular hypothesis to explain the formation of our solar system. He had reason to worry that his thoroughly mechanistic explanation might run afoul of Biblical fundamentalists who advocated the traditional doctrine of strict creationism. This is illustrative of a tension with which he had to deal all of his adult life—regarding how to reconcile Christian faith and scientific knowledge—which his philosophy of religion would address.

Third, although this is a bit of an oversimplification, before Kant, modern European philosophy was generally split into two rival camps: the Continental Rationalists, following Descartes, subscribed to a theory of a priori innate ideas that provide a basis for universal and necessary knowledge, while the British Empiricists, following Locke, subscribed to a tabula rasa theory, denying innate ideas and maintaining that our knowledge must ultimately be based on sense experience. This split vitally affected views regarding knowledge of God. Descartes and his followers were convinced that a priori knowledge of the existence of God, as an infinitely perfect Being, was possible and favored (what Kant would later call) the Ontological Argument as a way to establish it. By contrast, Locke and his followers spurned such a priori reasoning and resorted to empirical approaches, such as the Cosmological Argument and the Teleological Arguments or Design Arguments. An important Continental Rationalist was the German Leibniz, whose philosophy was systematized by Christian Wolff; in the eighteenth century, the Leibnizian-Wolffian philosophy was replacing scholasticism in German universities. Kant’s family pastor and the professor who was so important in his education were both significantly influenced by Wolff’s philosophy, so that their young student was easily drawn into that orbit. But he also came to study British Empiricists and was particularly disturbed by the challenges posed by the skeptical David Hume, which would gradually undermine his attachment to rationalism. A vital feature of Kant’s mature philosophy is his attempt to work out a synthesis of these two great rival approaches.

Fourth, the eighteenth century was the heyday of the intellectual movement of the Enlightenment in Europe (as well as in North America), which was committed to ideals that Kant would appropriate as his own—including those of reason, experience, science, liberty, and progress. Frederick II, who was the Prussian king for most of Kant’s adult life (from 1740 to 1786) was called both “Frederick the Great” and “the Enlightenment King.” Hume and Wolff were both Enlightenment philosophers, as was Kant himself, who published a sort of manifesto for the movement, called “What Is Enlightenment?” (1784). There he calls his an age of developing enlightenment, though not yet a fully enlightened age. He champions the cause of the free use of reason in public discussion, including freedom from censorship regarding publishing on religion (Essays, pp. 41-46).

Fifth, Kant himself faced a personal crisis when the Prussian government condemned his published book, Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone. As long as Frederick the Great, “the Enlightenment King,” ruled, Kant and other Prussian scholars had broad latitude to publish controversial religious ideas in an intellectual atmosphere of general tolerance. But Frederick was succeeded by his illiberal nephew, Frederick William II, who appointed a former preacher named Wöllner as his reactionary minister of spiritual affairs. The anti-Enlightenment Wöllner issued edicts forbidding any deviations from orthodox Biblical doctrines and requiring approval by official state censors, prior to publication, for all works dealing with religion. Kant managed to get the first book of his Religion cleared by one of Wöllner’s censors in Berlin. But he was denied permission to publish Book II, which was seen as violating orthodox Biblical doctrines. Having publicly espoused the right of scholars to publish even controversial ideas, Kant sought and got permission from the philosophical faculty at Jena (which also had that authority) to publish the second, third, and fourth books of his Religion and proceeded to do so. When Wöllner found out about it, he was furious and sent Kant a letter, which he had written and signed, on behalf of the king, censuring Kant and threatening him with harsh consequences, should he ever repeat the offense. Kant wrote a reply to the king, promising, “as your Majesty’s most loyal subject,” to refrain from all further public discussion of religion. Until that king died (in 1797), Kant kept his promise. But, as he later explained (Theology, pp. 239-243), that carefully worded qualifying phrase meant that the commitment would pass with that king, after whose death Kant, in fact, did resume publishing on religion.

2. God in Some Pre-critical Writings

Kant’s pre-critical writings are those that precede his Inaugural Dissertation of 1770, which marked his assumption of the chair in logic and metaphysics at the university. These writings reflect a general commitment to the Leibnizian-Wolffian rationalist tradition. Near the beginning of his Universal Natural History and Theory of the Heavens of 1755, Kant observes that the harmonious order of the universe points to its divinely governing first Cause; near the end of it, he writes that even now the universe is permeated by the divine energy of an omnipotent Deity (Cosmogony, pp. 14 and 153). In his New Exposition of the First Principles of Metaphysical Knowledge (of the same year), he points to God’s existence as the necessary condition of all possibility (Exposition, pp. 224-225).

In The One Possible Basis for a Demonstration of the Existence of God of 1763, after warning his readers that any attempt at proving divine reality will plunge us into the “dark ocean without coasts and without lighthouses” that is metaphysics, he develops that line of argumentation towards God as the unconditioned condition of all possibility. He denies the Cartesian thesis that existence is a predicate, thus undermining modern versions of the Ontological Argument. The absolutely necessary Being that is the ground of all possibility must be one, simple, immutable, eternal, the highest reality, and a spirit, he argues. He analyzes possible theoretical proofs of God into four possible sorts. Two of these—the Ontological, which he rejects, and his own—are based on possibility; the other two—the Cosmological and the Teleological (Design), both of which he deems inconclusive—are empirical. The final sentence of the book maintains that, though we must be convinced of God’s existence, logically demonstrating it is not required (Basis, pp. 43, 45, 57, 69, 71, 79, 81, 83, 87, 223, 225, 229, 231, and 239). That same year, Kant also published his Enquiry concerning the Clarity of the Principles of Natural Theology and Ethics. Here, while still expressing doubts that any metaphysical system of knowledge has yet been achieved, he nevertheless maintains his confidence that rational argumentation can lead to metaphysical knowledge, including that of God, as the absolutely necessary Being (Writings, pp. 14, 25, and 29-30). What we see in these pre-critical writings is the stamp of Leibnizian-Wolffian rationalism, but also the developing influence of Hume, whom Kant was surely studying during this period.

3. Each Critique as Pivotal

The heart of Kant’s philosophical system is the triad of books constituting his great critiques: his Critique of Pure Reason, published in 1781 (the A edition), with a significantly revised second edition appearing in 1787 (the B edition); his Critique of Practical Reason, published in 1788; and his Critique of Judgment, published in 1790.

a. The First Critique

Though some key ideas of the Critique of Pure Reason were adumbrated in Kant’s Inaugural Dissertation of 1770 (in Writings), this first Critique is revolutionary in the sense that, because of it, the history of philosophy became radically different from what it had been before its publication. We cannot adequately explore all of the game-changing details of the epistemology (theory of knowledge) he develops there, which has been discussed elsewhere in the IEP (see “Immanuel Kant: Metaphysics”), but will only consider the elements that have a direct bearing on his philosophy of religion.

The monumental breakthrough of this book is Kant’s invention of the transcendental method in philosophy, which allows him to discover a middle path between modern rationalism, which attributes intellectual intuition (for example, innate ideas) to humans, enabling them to have universal and necessary factual knowledge, and modern empiricism, which maintains that we only have sensible intuition, making it difficult to see how we can ever achieve universal and necessary factual knowledge through reason. Kant argues that both sides are partly correct and partly mistaken. He agrees with the empiricists that all human factual knowledge begins with sensible intuition (which is the only sort we have), but avoids the skeptical conclusions to which this leads them by agreeing with the rationalists that we bring something a priori to the knowing process, while rejecting their dogmatic assumption that it must be the innate ideas of intellectual intuition. According to Kant, universal and necessary factual knowledge requires both sensible experience, providing its content, and a priori structures of the mind, providing its form. Either without the other is insufficient. He famously writes, “Thoughts without content are empty, intuitions without concepts are blind” (Critique, A51/B75). Without empirical, sensible content, there is nothing for us to know; but without those a priori structures, we have no way of giving intelligible form to whatever content we may have.

The transcendental method seeks the necessary a priori conditions of experience, of knowledge, and of metaphysical speculation. The two a priori forms of sensibility are time and space: that is, for us to make sense of them, all objects of sensation, whether external or internal, must be temporally organizable and all objects of external sensation must also be spatially organizable. But time and space are only forms of experience and not objects of experience, and they can only be known to apply to objects of sensible intuition. When sensory inputs are received by us and spatio-temporally organized, the a priori necessary condition of our having objective knowledge is that one or more of twelve concepts of the understanding, also called “categories,” must be applied to our spatio-temporal representations. These twelve categories include reality, unity, substance, causality, and existence. Again, none of them is an object of experience; rather, they are all categories of the human mind, necessary for our knowing any objects of experience. And, again, they can only be known to apply to objects of sensible intuition. Now, by its very nature, metaphysics (including theology) necessarily speculates about ultimate reality that is not given to sensible intuition and therefore transcends any and all human perceptual experience. It is a fact of human experience that we do engage in metaphysical speculation. So what are the transcendental conditions of our capacity to do so? Kant’s answer is that they are the three a priori ideas of pure reason—the self or soul, the cosmos or universe as an orderly whole, and God, the one of direct concern to us here. But, as we never can have sensible experience of objects corresponding to such transcendent ideas and as the concepts of the understanding, without which human knowledge is impossible, can only be known to apply to objects of possible experience, knowledge of the soul, of the cosmos, and of God is impossible, in principle.

So what are we to make of ideas that can never yield knowledge? Here Kant makes another innovative contribution to epistemology. He says that ideas can have two possible functions in human thinking. Some (for example, empirical) ideas have a “constitutive” function, in that they can be used to constitute knowledge, while others have only a “regulative” function (Critique, A180/B222), in that, while they can never constitute knowledge, they do serve the heuristic purpose of regulating our thought and action. This is related to Kant’s dualistic distinction between the aspect of reality that comprises all phenomenal appearances and that which involves our noumenal ideas of things-in-themselves. (Although it is important, we cannot here explore this distinction in the depth it deserves.) Because metaphysical ideas are unknowable, they cannot serve any “constitutive” function. Still, they have great “regulative” value for both our thinking and our voluntary choices. They are relevant to our value-commitments, including those of a religious sort. Three such regulative ideas are Kant’s postulates of practical reason, which are “God, freedom, and immortality” (Critique, A3/B7). Although none of them refers to an object of empirical knowledge, he maintains that it is reasonable for us to postulate them as matters of rational faith. This sort of belief, which is subjectively, but not objectively, justifiable, is a middle ground between certain knowledge, which is objectively, as well as subjectively, justified, and mere arbitrary opinion, which is not even subjectively justified (Critique, A822/B850). Such rational belief can be religious—namely, faith in God.

Kant presents four logical puzzles that he calls “antinomies” to establish the natural dialectical illusions that our reason inevitably encounters when it engages metaphysical questions about cosmology in an open-minded fashion. The fourth of these particularly concerns us here, as reason purports to be able to prove both that there must be an absolutely necessary Being and that no such Being can exist. His dualism can expose this apparent contradiction as bogus, maintaining that in the realm of phenomenal appearances, everything exists contingently, with no necessary Being, but that in the realm of noumenal things-in-themselves there can be such a necessary Being.

But, we might wonder, what about the traditional arguments for God? If even one of them proves logically conclusive, would not that constitute some sort of knowledge of God? Here we encounter yet another great passage in the first Critique, where Kant’s epistemology leads him to a trenchant undermining of all such arguments. He maintains that there is a trichotomy of types of speculative arguments for God: the “physico-theological” Argument from Design, various Cosmological Arguments, and the non-empirical “Ontological” Argument. He cleverly shows that the first of these, even if it worked, would only establish a relatively intelligent and powerful architect of the world and not a necessarily existing Creator. In order to establish it as a necessary Being, some version of the second approach is needed. But, if that worked, it would still fail to show that the necessary creator is an infinitely perfect Being, worthy of religious devotion. Only the Ontological Argument will suffice to establish that. But here the problems accumulate. The Ontological Argument fails because it tries to attribute infinite, necessary existence to God; but existence, far from being a real predicate of anything, is merely a concept of the human understanding. Then the cosmological arguments also fail, in trying to establish that God is the necessary ultimate cause of the world, for both causality and necessity are merely categories of human understanding. Although Kant exhibits considerable respect for the teleological argument from design, in addition to its conclusion being so disappointingly limited, it also fails as a logical demonstration, in trying to show that an intelligent Designer must exist to account for the alleged intelligent design of the world. The problem is that we do not and cannot ever experience the world as a coherent whole, so that the argument’s premise is merely assumed without foundation. Thus Kant undermines the entire project of any philosophical theology that pretends to establish any knowledge of God (Critique, A592/B620-A614/B642 and A620/B648-A636/B664). Yet he remains a champion of religious faith as rationally justifiable. So how can he make such a position philosophically credible?

b. The Second Critique

Here we must turn to his ingenious Critique of Practical Reason. Although it is essentially a work of ethics, a significant part of it is devoted to establishing belief in God (as well as in the immortality of the soul) as a rationally justifiable postulate of practical reason, by means of what has come to be called his “moral argument.” The argument hinges on his claim that we have a moral duty to help bring about, not just the supreme good of moral virtue, which we can achieve by our own efforts in this life, but also “the highest good,” which is the “perfect” correlation of “happiness in exact proportion to morality.” Since there cannot be any moral obligation that it is impossible to meet (“ought” implies “can”), achieving this highest good must be possible. However, there is no reason to believe that it can ever be achieved by us alone, acting either individually or collectively, in this life. So it would seem that all our efforts in this life cannot suffice to achieve the highest good. Yet there must be such a sufficient condition, supernatural and with attributes far exceeding ours, identifiable with God, with whom we can collaborate in the achievement of the highest good, not merely here and now but in the hereafter. Thus he establishes God and human immortality as “morally necessary” hypotheses, matters of “rational faith.” This is also the basis of Kant’s idea of moral religion, which we shall discuss in more detail below. But, for now, we can observe his definition of “religion” as “the recognition of all duties as divine commands.” Thus the moral argument is not purely speculative but has a practical orientation. Kant does not pretend that the moral argument is constitutive of any knowledge. If he did, it could be easily refuted by denying that we have any obligation to achieve the highest good, because it is, for us, an impossible ideal. The moral argument rather deals with God as a regulative idea that can be shown to be a matter of rational belief. The famous sentence near the end of the second Critique provides a convenient bridge between it and the third: “Two things fill the mind with ever new and increasing admiration and awe, the oftener and more steadily we reflect on them: the starry heavens above me and the moral law within me” (Reason, pp. 114-115/AA V: 110-111, 126-130/AA V: 121-126, 134/AA V: 129-130, and 166/AA V: 161). As morality leads Kant to God and religion, so does the awesome teleological order of the universe.

c. The Third Critique

Although Kant’s Critique of Judgment is also not essentially a work in the philosophy of religion, its long appendix contains an important section that is germane for our purposes. We recall that, while criticizing the teleological argument from design, Kant exhibited a high regard for it. Such physical teleology points to a somewhat intelligent and powerful designing cause of the world. But now Kant pursues moral teleology, which will connect such a deity to our own practical purposes—not only to our natural desire for happiness, but to our moral worthiness to achieve it, which is a function of our own virtuous good will. He gives us another version of his moral argument for God, conceived not as the amoral, impersonal metaphysical principle indicated by the teleological argument from design, but rather as a personal deity who is the moral legislator and governor of the world. Again, all this points to God as a regulative matter of “moral faith,” without any pretense of establishing any theological knowledge (which would violate Kant’s own epistemology). Such faith is inescapably doubtful, in that it remains reasonable to maintain some doubt regarding it, and a matter of trust in teleological ends towards which we should be striving. Nor should we be so presumptuous as to suppose that we can ever comprehend God’s nature or purposes. It is only by analogy that we can contemplate such matters at all (Judgment, pp. 295-338/AA II: 442-485), a point which Kant more carefully develops in his Prolegomena.

4. The Prolegomena and Kant’s Lectures

a. The Prolegomena

Most—but not all—of the religious epistemology that is of note in Kant’s Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics is already contained in his more philosophically impressive first Critique and will not be repeated here. But a few pages of its “Conclusion” add something that we have not yet considered. One of the abiding problems of the philosophy of religion is how we can speak (and even think) about God except in anthropomorphic human terms without resorting to an indeterminate fog of ineffable mysticism. The great rationalists are particularly challenged here, and Hume, whom Kant credits with awaking him from his dogmatic slumbers, mercilessly exploits their dilemma. Kant’s project continues to be to navigate a perilous middle path between the equally problematic approaches of anthropomorphism and mysticism. Kant appreciates the dilemma as acutely as Hume, but wants to solve it rather than merely highlighting it. Hume means to replace theism with an indeterminate deism. Kant, himself a theist, admits that Hume’s objections against theism are devastating but holds that his arguments undermine only attempted deistic proofs and not deistic beliefs. Remembering that the concepts of the understanding cannot be known to apply to anything that transcends all possible experience, we can see that it will be a challenge for Kant to evade Hume’s dilemma. His approach is to distinguish between a malignant “dogmatic anthropomorphism,” which tries literally to attribute to God natural qualities, such as those attributable to humans, and a more benign “symbolic anthropomorphism,” which merely draws an analogy between God’s relation to our world and relations among things in our world, while avoiding thinking of them as identical. Kant’s example is helpful here: while we have no possible natural knowledge of God’s love for us and should acknowledge that it cannot be identical to any (necessarily limited) human love, we can use analogical language to think and talk about God’s love for us—as the love of human parents is directed to the welfare of their children, so God’s love for us is directed to human well-being. Thus, Kant maintains, we can avoid the vicious sort of dogmatic anthropomorphism which Hume rightly attacks and, for example, attribute to God a rational relationship to our world without pretending that divine reason is exactly the same as ours, for example, discursive and, thus, limited (Prolegomena, pp. 5, 19, and 96-99). Thinking and speaking of God with analogous language can facilitate a theology that neither is anthropomorphic in a bad way nor succumbs to the dialectical illusions from which Kant’s epistemology would save us.

b. Kant’s Lectures

A somewhat neglected, but still important, dimension of Kant’s philosophy of religion can be found in his Lectures on Philosophical Theology, which comprises an introduction, a first part on transcendental theology, and a second part on moral theology. After maintaining that rational theology’s essential value is practical rather than speculative, he defines religion as “the application of theology to morality,” which is a bit broader than the definition of the second Critique but is in line with it. He conceives of the God of rational theology as the causal author and moral ruler of the world. He considers himself a theist rather than a deist because he is committed to a free and moral “living God,” holy and just, as well as omniscient and omnipotent, as a postulate of practical reason (Lectures, pp. 24, 26, 30, and 41-42). In the first part of the Lectures, Kant considers the speculative proofs of God, as well as the use of analogous language as a hedge against gross anthropomorphism. But, as we have already discussed the more famous treatments of these topics (in the first Critique and the Prolegomena, respectively), we can pass over these here.

The second part of the Lectures starts with a version of the moral argument, which we have already considered (in connection with its more famous treatment in the second Critique). This line of reasoning leads to the moral attributes of “God as a holy lawgiver, a benevolent sustainer of the world, and a just judge.” A major problem of the philosophy of religion we have yet to consider is the problem of evil. If, indeed, an infinitely perfect and supremely moral God governs the world with divine providence, how can there be so much evil, in all its multiple forms, in that world? More specifically, for Kant, how can moral evil be consistent with divine holiness, pain and suffering with divine benevolence, and morally undeserved well-being and the lack of it with divine justice? Despite God’s holiness, moral evil is a function of our free will as rational creatures and our responsibility for our own development. Despite God’s benevolence towards personal creatures, the physical evils of pain and suffering provide incentives for our progressing towards fulfillment. And, despite God’s justice, the disproportion between virtue and well-being in this life must be temporary, to be rectified hereafter (Lectures, pp. 112 and 115-121). This earlier (from the 1780s) attempt at theodicy on Kant’s part was neither particularly original nor particularly convincing.

5. Other Important Works

Kant deals with the problem of evil more impressively in his “On the Miscarriage of All Philosophical Trials in Theodicy” (1791). He analyzes possible attempts at theodicy into three approaches: (a) it can argue that what we consider evil actually is not, so that there is really no conflict; (b) it can argue that the conflict between evil and God is naturally necessitated; and (c) it can argue that evil, though contingent, is the result of someone other than God. Kant’s own earlier work attempted to combine the second and third strategies; but here he concludes that all of these approaches must fail. More specifically, attempts to show that there is no pernicious conflict between moral evil and God’s holiness, between the physical evils of pain and suffering and God’s goodness, and, finally, between the disproportion of happiness and misery to virtue and vice and God’s justice, all fail using all three approaches. Thus Kant’s considered conclusion is negative: the doubts that are legitimately raised by the evil in our world can neither be conclusively answered nor conclusively refute God’s infinite moral wisdom. Thus, theodicy, like matters of religion more generally, turns out to be a matter of faith and not one of knowledge (Theology, pp. 24-34; see also “What Does It Mean to Orient Oneself in Thinking?” in Theology pp. 12-15, and “Speculative Beginning of Human History,” in Essays). In a work published the year he died, Kant analyzes the core of his theological doctrine into three articles of faith: (1) he believes in one God, who is the causal source of all good in the world; (2) he believes in the possibility of harmonizing God’s purposes with our greatest good; and (3) he believes in human immortality as the necessary condition of our continued approach to the highest good possible (Metaphysics, p. 131). All of these doctrines of faith can be rationally supported. This leaves open the issue of whether further religious beliefs, drawn from revelation, can be added to this core. As Kant makes clear in The Conflict of the Faculties, he does not deny that divinely revealed truths are possible, but only that they are knowable. So, we might wonder, of what practical use is revelation if it cannot be an object of knowledge? His answer is that, even if it can never constitute knowledge, it can serve the regulative function of edification—contributing to our moral improvement and adding motivation to our moral purposes (Theology, pp. 283 and 287-288).

6. His Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone

Kant’s Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone of 1793 is considered by some to be the most underrated book in the entire history of the philosophy of religion. In a letter to a theologian, he subsequently repeats the questions with which he thinks any philosophical system should deal (three of them in his first Critique, A 805/B 833; see also his Logic, pp. 28-30, where he adds a fourth). The first one, regarding human knowledge, had been covered in the first Critique and the Prolegomena; the second, regarding practical values, was considered in his various writings on ethics and socio-political philosophy; the fourth, regarding human nature, had been covered in his philosophical anthropology. Now, with Religion, Kant addresses the third question of what we can reasonably hope for, and moves towards completing his system (Correspondence, pp. 458-459). Thus we can conclude that Kant himself sees this book, the publication of which got him into trouble with the Prussian government, as crucial to his philosophical purposes. Hence we should take it seriously here as representative of his own rational theology. In his Preface to the first edition, he again points out that reflection on moral obligation should lead us to religion (Religion, pp. 3-6; see also Education, pp. 111-114, for his analysis of how religion should be taught to children). In his Preface to the second edition, he offers an illuminating metaphor of two concentric circles—the inner one representing the core of the one religion of pure moral reason and the outer one representing many revealed historical religions, all of which should include and build on that core (Religion, p. 11).

In the first book, Kant considers our innate natural predisposition to good (in being animals, humans, and persons) and our equally innate propensity to evil (in our frailty, impurity, and wickedness). Whether we end up being praiseworthy or blameworthy depends, not on our sensuous nature or our theoretical reason, but on the use we make of our free will, which is naturally oriented towards both good and evil. There are two dimensions of what we call “will,” both of which are important in grasping Kant’s view here. On the one hand, there is our capacity for free choice (his word is “Willkür”); on the other hand, there is practical reason as rationally legislating moral choice and action (“Wille”). Thus a “good will” chooses in accordance with the rational demands of the moral law. At any rate, we are born with a propensity to evil; but whether we become evil depends on our own free acts of will. Thus Kant demythologizes the Christian doctrine of original sin. He then distinguishes between the phony religion of mere worship designed to win favor for ourselves and the authentic moral religion of virtuous behavior. Although it is legitimate to hope for God’s grace as helping us to lead morally good lives, it is mere fanaticism to imagine that we can become good by soliciting grace rather than freely choosing virtuous conduct (Religion, pp. 21-26, 30, 32, 35, and 47-49).

In the second book, Jesus of Nazareth is presented as an archetype symbolizing our ability to resist our propensity to evil and to approach the virtuous ideal of moral perfection. What Kant does not say is whether or not, in addition to being a moral model whose example we should try to follow, Jesus is also of divine origin in some unique manner attested to by miracles. Just as he neither denies nor affirms the divinity of Christ, so Kant avoids committing himself regarding belief in miracles, which can lead us into superstition (Religion, pp. 51, 54, 57, 74, 77, and 79-82; for more on the mystery of the Incarnation, see Theology, pp. 264-265).

In the third book, Kant expresses his rational hope for the ultimate supremacy of good over evil and the establishment of an ethical commonwealth of persons under a personal God, who is the divine law-giver and moral ruler—the ideal of the invisible church, as opposed to actual realities of visible churches. Whereas statutory religion focuses on obedient external behavior, true religion concerns internal commitment (or good will). Mere worship is a worthless substitute for good choices and virtuous conduct. Here Kant makes a particularly provocative claim, that, ultimately, there is only “one (true) religion,” the religion of morality, while there can be various historical “faiths” promoting it. From this perspective, Judaism, Islam, and the various denominations of Christianity are all legitimate faiths, to be located in Kant’s metaphorical outer circle, including the true religion of morality, his metaphorical inner circle. However, some faiths can be relatively more adequate expressions of the religion of moral reason than others (Religion, pp. 86, 89-92, 95, and 97-98; see also Theology, pp. 262-265).

In his particularly inflammatory fourth book, Kant probes the distinction between legitimate religious service and the pseudo-service of religious clericalism. From our human perspective, religion—both revealed and natural—should be regarded as “the recognition of all duties as divine commands.” Kant embraces the position of “pure rationalist,” rather than naturalism (which denies divine revelation) or pure supernaturalism (which considers it necessary), in that he accepts the possibility of revelation but does not dogmatically regard it as necessary. He acknowledges scripture scholars’ valuable role in helping to disseminate religious truth so long as they respect “universal human reason as the supremely commanding principle.” Christianity is both a natural and a revealed religion, and Kant shows how the gospel of Matthew expresses Kantian ethics, with Jesus as its wise moral teacher. Following his moral teachings is the means to true religious service, whereas substituting an attachment to external worship allegedly required instead of moral behavior is mere “pseudo-service.” Superstition and fanaticism are typical aspects of such illusions and substituting superstitious rituals for morally virtuous conduct is mere “fetishism.” Kant denounces clericalism as promoting such misguided pseudo-service. The ideal of genuine godliness comprises a combination of fear of God and love of God, which should converge to help render us persons of morally good will. So what about such religious practices as prayer, church attendance, and participation in sacraments? They can be either good expressions of devotion, if they bind us together in moral community (occupying Kant’s inner circle) or bad expressions of mere pseudo-service, if designed to ingratiate us with God (an accretion to the outer circle not rooted in the inner circle of genuine moral commitment). Mere external shows of piety must never be substituted for authentic inner virtue (Religion, pp. 142-143, 147-153, 156-158, 162, 165, 167-168, 170, and 181-189; cf. Ethics, pp. 78-116). Kant’s Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone provides a capstone for the revolutionary treatment of religion associated with his critical philosophy.

7. Some Tantalizing Suggestions from the Opus Postumum

Yet it is quite admirable that, in the last few years of his life, despite struggling with the onset of dementia that made any such task increasingly challenging, he kept trying to explore new dimensions of the philosophy of religion. As has already been admitted, the results, located in his fragmentary Opus Postumum, are more provocative than satisfying; yet they are nevertheless worthy of brief consideration here. The work comprises a vast quantity of scattered remarks, many of which are familiar to readers of his earlier writings, but some of which represent acute, fresh insights, albeit none of them adequately developed. Here again Kant writes that reflection on moral duty, determinable by means of the categorical imperative, can reasonably lead us to the idea of God, as a rational moral agent with unlimited power over the realms of nature and of freedom, who prescribes our duties as divine commands. He then adds a bold idea, which breaks with his own previous orthodox theological concept of a transcendent God. Developing his old notion of God as “an ideal of human reason,” he identifies God with our concept of moral duty rather than as an independent substance. This notion of an immanent God (that is, one internal to our world rather than transcendently separate from it), while not carefully worked out by Kant himself, would be developed by later German Idealists (most significantly, Hegel). While conceding that we think of God as an omnipotent, omniscient, and omnibenevolent personal Being, Kant now denies that personality can be legitimately attributed to God—again stepping out of mainstream Judeo-Christian doctrine. Also, rather than still postulating God as an independent reality, he here says that “God and the world are correlates,” interdependent and mutually implicating one another. Unfortunately, we can only conjecture as to what, exactly, he means by this claim. Referring to Spinoza (the most important pre-Kantian panentheist in modern philosophy), he pushes the point even more radically, writing, “I am in the highest being.” But, then, Kant goes on to condemn Spinoza’s panentheistic conception of God (that is, the view also found in Hegel, that God contains our world rather than transcending it) as outlandish “enthusiastic” fanaticism. In fact, he suggests the inverse—instead of holding that we are in God, Kant now indicates that God is in us, though different from us, in that God’s reality is ideal rather than substantial. He proceeds to maintain that not only God is infinite, but so are the world and rational freedom, identifying God with “the inner vital spirit of man in the world.” Kant makes one final controversial claim when he denies that a concept of God is even essential to religion (Opus, pp. 200-204, 210-211, 213-214, 225, 229, 231, 234-236, 239-240, and 248). This denial is clearly not an aspect of Kant’s thought that is familiar and famous, and we should beware of presuming that we understand precisely what should be made of it. But what is undeniable is what a long and soaring intellectual journey Kant made as he developed his ideas on God and religion from his pre-critical writings through the central, revolutionary works of his philosophical maturity and into the puzzling but tantalizing thought-experiments of his old age.

8. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

Immanuel Kant, “An Answer to the Question: What is Enlightenment?” trans. Ted Humphrey, in Essays.
Immanuel Kant, The Conflict of the Faculties, trans. Mary J. Gregor and Robert Anchor, in Theology.
Immanuel Kant, Correspondence, trans. and edited by Arnulf Zweig. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Immanuel Kant, Critique of Judgment, trans. J. H. Bernard (called “Judgment”). New York: Hafner, 1968. References to this translation are accompanied by references to the Akademie Ausgabe Volume II.
Immanuel Kant, Critique of Practical Reason, trans. Lewis White Beck (called “Reason”). Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1956. References to this translation are accompanied by references to the Akademie Ausgabe Volume V.
Immanuel Kant, Critique of Pure Reason, trans. Norman Kemp Smith (called Critique). New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1965. References are to the A and B German editions.
Immanuel Kant, Education, trans. Annette Churton. Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press, 1960.
Immanuel Kant, “The End of All Things,” trans. Allen W. Wood, in Theology.
Immanuel Kant, Enquiry concerning the Clarity of the Principles of Natural Theology and Ethics, trans. G. B. Kerford and D. E. Walford, in Writings.
Immanuel Kant, Kant’s Cosmogony, trans. W. Hastie (called “Cosmogony”). New York: Garland, 1968.
Immanuel Kant, Lectures on Ethics, trans. Louis Infield (called “Ethics”). New York: Harper & Row, 1963.
Immanuel Kant, Lectures on Philosophical Theology, trans. Allen W. Wood and Gertrude M. Clark (called “Lectures”). Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1978.
Immanuel Kant, Logic, trans. Robert Hartman and Wolfgang Schwarz. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1974.
Immanuel Kant, New Exposition of the First Principles of Metaphysical Knowledge, trans. F. E. England (called “Exposition”), in England (below).
Immanuel Kant, On the Form and Principles of the Sensible and Intelligible World (Inaugural Dissertation), trans. G. B. Kerford and D. E. Walford, in Writings.
Immanuel Kant, “On the Miscarriage of All Philosophical Trials in Theodicy,” trans. George di Giovanni, in Theology.
Immanuel Kant, The One Possible Basis for a Demonstration of the Existence of God, trans. Gordon Treash (called “Basis”). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press, 1994.
Immanuel Kant, Opus Postumum, edited by Eckart Förster and trans. Eckart Förster and Michael Rosen (called “Opus”). New York: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
Immanuel Kant, Perpetual Peace and Other Essays, trans. Ted Humphrey (called “Essays”). Indianapolis: Hackett, 1983.
Immanuel Kant, Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics, trans. Paul Carus and revised by James W. Ellington (called “Prolegomena”). Indianapolis: Hackett, 1977.
Immanuel Kant, Religion and Rational Theology, trans. and edited by Allen W. Wood and George di Giovanni (called “Theology”). New York: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Immanuel Kant, Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone, trans. Theodore M. Greene and Hoyt H. Hudson (called “Religion”). New York: Harper & Row, 1960.
Immanuel Kant, Selected Pre-Critical Writings and Correspondence with Beck, trans. G. B. Kerford and D. E. Walford (called “Writings”). Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1968.
Immanuel Kant, “Speculative Beginning of Human History,” trans. Ted Humphrey, in Essays.
Immanuel Kant, Universal Natural History and Theory of the Heavens, trans. W. Hastie, in Cosmogony.
Immanuel Kant, “What Does It Mean to Orient Oneself in Thinking?”, trans. Allen W. Wood, in Theology.
Immanuel Kant, What Real Progress Has Metaphysics Made in Germany since the Time of Leibniz and Wolff?, trans. Ted Humphrey (called “Metaphysics”). New York: Abaris Books, 1983.

b. Secondary Sources

James Collins, The Emergence of Philosophy of Religion. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1967.
- Chapters 3 through 5 deal with Kant’s philosophy of religion in a meticulous manner.
Frederick Copleston, S. J., A History of Philosophy, Volume 6. Garden City: Image Books, 1964.
- Though old, this volume still represents exemplary Kant scholarship.
A. Hazard Dakin, “Kant and Religion,” in The Heritage of Kant, edited by George Tapley Whitney and David F. Bowers. New York: Russell & Russell, 1962.
- This is a non-technical critical analysis of Kant’s views on religion.
Michel Despland, Kant on History and Religion. Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press, 1973.
- The second part of this book offers a detailed coverage of Kant’s philosophy of religion.
George di Giovanni, “Translator’s Introduction” to Religion within the Boundaries of Mere Reason, in Theology, pp. 41-54.
- This is an informative account of the history of Kant’s Religion.
S. Morris Engel, “Kant’s ‘Refutation’ of the Ontological Argument,” in Kant: A Collection of Critical Essays, edited by Robert Paul Wolff. Garden City: Anchor Books, 1967.
- This remains a provocative critical analysis of Kant’s critique of this argument.
F. E. England, Kant’s Conception of God. New York: Humanities Press, 1968.
- This is a very good study of Kant’s development of a philosophy of religion.
Chris L. Firestone and Nathan Jacobs, In Defense of Kant’s Religion. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2008.
- This book cleverly presents criticisms of Kant’s views answered by defenses.
Chris L. Firestone and Stephen R. Palmquist, editors, Kant and the New Philosophy of Religion. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2006.
- This is a good anthology of recent essays from both philosophical and theological perspectives.
Chris L. Firestone, “Making Sense Out of Tradition: Theology and Conflict in Kant’s Philosophy of Religion,” in Kant and the New Philosophy of Religion, pp. 141-156.
- This article does a good job of explaining Kant’s views on the proper roles of philosophers and theologians in dealing with religion.
Eckart Förster, Kant’s Final Synthesis: An Essay on the Opus Postumum. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2000.
- This is a close study of Kant’s final work.
Theodore M. Greene, “The Historical Context and Religious Significance of Kant’s Religion,” translator’s introduction to Religion.
- This offers a long and still valuable perspective on Kant’s major work in the philosophy of religion.
Manfred Kuehn, Kant: A Biography. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
- This is arguably the best intellectual biography of Kant in English.
G. E. Michalson, Jr., The Historical Dimensions of a Rational Faith: The Role of History in Kant’s Religious Thought. Washington, DC: University Press of America, 1979.
- This book relates Kant’s views on religion to his conception of history.
Stephen R. Palmquist, “Introduction” to Religion within the Bounds of Bare Reason, trans. Werner S. Pluhar. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2009.
- This is a long and careful introduction to yet another translation of Kant’s most important book in the philosophy of religion.
Stephen R. Palmquist, Kant’s Critical Religion. Aldershot, UK: Ashgate, 2000.
- This book explores its subject in astonishing detail.
Wayne P. Pomerleau, Western Philosophies of Religion. New York: Ardsley House, 1998.
- The sixth chapter of this book is a detailed study of Kant’s philosophy of religion.
Bernard M. G. Reardon, Kant as Philosophical Theologian. Totowa, NJ: Barnes & Noble Books, 1988.
- This fairly short book nevertheless develops a penetrating analysis of the subject.
Philip J. Rossi and Michael Wreen, editors, Kant’s Philosophy of Religion Reconsidered. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1991.
- This anthology contains some valuable essays on Kant’s theory.
Clement C. J. Webb, Kant’s Philosophy of Religion. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1926.
- This classic general treatment of this topic is still valuable.
Allen W. Wood, “General Introduction” to Theology, pp. xi-xxiv.
- This is brief but, like all of Wood’s work on this subject, well done.
Allen W. Wood, “Kant’s Deism,” in Kant’s Philosophy of Religion Reconsidered, pp. 1-21.
- This is a provocative article considering the pros and cons of regarding Kant as a deist.
Allen W. Wood, Kant’s Moral Religion. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1970.
- This is an excellent treatment of Kant’s view of morality as the core of true religion.
Allen W. Wood, Kant’s Rational Theology. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1978.
- This book is more focused on Kant’s critique of speculative theology.
Allen W. Wood, “Rational Theology, Moral Faith, and Religion,” in The Cambridge Companion to Kant, edited by Paul Guyer. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
- This essay offers an illuminating connection of important strands of Kant’s philosophy of religion.

Author Information

Wayne P. Pomerleau
Email: Pomerleau@calvin.gonzaga.edu
Gonzaga University
U. S. A.

Metaethics

Metaethics is a branch of analytic philosophy that explores the status, foundations, and scope of moral values, properties, and words. Whereas the fields of applied ethics and normative theory focus on what is moral, metaethics focuses on what morality itself is. Just as two people may disagree about the ethics of, for example, physician-assisted suicide, while nonetheless agreeing at the more abstract level of a general normative theory such as Utilitarianism, so too may people who disagree at the level of a general normative theory nonetheless agree about the fundamental existence and status of morality itself, or vice versa. In this way, metaethics may be thought of as a highly abstract way of thinking philosophically about morality. For this reason, metaethics is also occasionally referred to as “second-order” moral theorizing, to distinguish it from the “first-order” level of normative theory.

Metaethical positions may be divided according to how they respond to questions such as the following:

What exactly are people doing when they use moral words such as “good” and “right”?
What precisely is a moral value in the first place, and are such values similar to other familiar sorts of entities, such as objects and properties?
Where do moral values come from—what is their source and foundation?
Are some things morally right or wrong for all people at all times, or does morality instead vary from person to person, context to context, or culture to culture?

Metaethical positions respond to such questions by examining the semantics of moral discourse, the ontology of moral properties, the significance of anthropological disagreement about moral values and practices, the psychology of how morality affects us as embodied human agents, and the epistemology of how we come to know moral values. The sections below consider these different aspects of metaethics.

History of Metaethics
1. Metaethics before Moore
2. Metaethics in the Twentieth-Century
The Normative Relevance of Metaethics
Semantic Issues in Metaethics
1. Cognitivism versus Non-Cognitivism
2. Theories of Moral Truth
Ontological Issues in Metaethics
1. Moral Realisms
2. Moral Relativisms
Psychology and Metaethics
Epistemological Issues in Metaethics
1. Thick and Thin Moral Concepts
2. Moral Justification and Explanation
Anthropological Considerations
1. Cross-Cultural Differences
2. Cross-Cultural Similarities
Political Implications of Metaethics
References and Further Reading
1. Textual Citations
2. Anthologies and Introductions

1. History of Metaethics

a. Metaethics before Moore

Although the word “metaethics” (more commonly “meta-ethics” among British and Australian philosophers) was coined in the early part of the twentieth century, the basic philosophical concern regarding the status and foundations of moral language, properties, and judgments goes back to the very beginnings of philosophy. Several characters in Plato’s dialogues, for instance, arguably represent metaethical stances familiar to philosophers today: Callicles in Plato’s Gorgias (482c-486d) advances the thesis that Nature does not recognize moral distinctions, and that such distinctions are solely constructions of human convention; and Thrasymachus in Plato’s Republic (336b-354c) advocates a type of metaethical nihilism by defending the view that justice is nothing above and beyond whatever the strong say that it is. Socrates’ defense of the separation of divine commands from moral values in Plato’s Euthyphro (10c-12e) is also a forerunner of modern metaethical debates regarding the secular foundation of moral values. Aristotle’s grounding of virtue and happiness in the biological and political nature of humans (in Book One of his Nicomachean Ethics) has also been examined from the perspective of contemporary metaethics (compare, MacIntyre 1984; Heinaman 1995). In the classical Chinese tradition, early Daoist thinkers such as Zhuangzi have also been interpreted as weighing in on metaethical issues by critiquing the apparent inadequacy and conventionality of human attempts to reify moral concepts and terms (compare, Kjellberg & Ivanhoe 1996). Many Medieval accounts of morality that ground values in religious texts, commands, or emulation may also be understood as defending certain metaethical positions (see Divine Command Theory). In contrast, during the European Enlightenment, Immanuel Kant sought a foundation for ethics that was less prone to religious sectarian differences, by looking to what he believed to be universal capacities and requirements of human reason. In particular, Kant’s discussions in his Groundwork on the Metaphysics of Morals of a universal “moral law” necessitated by reason have been fertile ground for the articulation of many contemporary neo-Kantian defenses of moral objectivity (for example, Gewirth 1977; Boylan 2004).

Since metaethics is the study of the foundations, if any, of morality, it has flourished especially during historical periods of cultural diversity and flux. For example, responding to the cross-cultural contact engendered by the Greco-Persian Wars, the ancient Greek historian Herodotus reflected on the apparent challenge to cultural superiority posed by the fact that different cultures have seemingly divergent moral practices. A comparable interest in metaethics dominated seventeenth and eighteenth-century moral discourse in Western Europe, as theorists struggled to respond to the destabilization of traditional symbols of authority—for example, scientific revolutions, religious fragmentation, civil wars—and the grim pictures of human egoism that thinkers such as John Mandeville and Thomas Hobbes were presenting (compare, Stephen 1947). Most famously, the eighteenth-century Scottish philosopher David Hume may be understood as a forerunner of contemporary metaethics when he questioned the extent to which moral judgments might ultimately rest on human passions rather than reason, and whether certain virtues are ultimately natural or artificial (compare, Darwall 1995).

b. Metaethics in the Twentieth-Century

Analytic metaethics in its modern form, however, is generally recognized as beginning with the moral writings of G.E. Moore. (Although, see Hurka 2003 for an argument that Moore’s innovations must be contextualized by reference to the preceding thought of Henry Sidgwick.) In his groundbreaking Principia Ethica (1903), Moore urged a distinction between merely theorizing about moral goods on the one hand, versus theorizing about the very concept of “good” itself. (Moore’s specific metaethical views are considered in more detail in the sections below.) Following Moore, analytic moral philosophy became focused almost exclusively on metaethical questions for the next few decades, as ethicists debated whether or not moral language describes facts and whether or not moral properties can be scientifically or “naturalistically” analyzed. (See below for a more specific description of these different metaethical trends.) Then, in the 1970s, largely inspired by the work of philosophers such as John Rawls and Peter Singer, analytic moral philosophy began to refocus on questions of applied ethics and normative theories. Today, metaethics remains a thriving branch of moral philosophy and contemporary metaethicists frequently adopt an interdisciplinary approach to the study of moral values, drawing on disciplines as diverse as social psychology, cultural anthropology, comparative politics, as well as other fields within philosophy itself, such as metaphysics, epistemology, action theory, and the philosophy of science.

2. The Normative Relevance of Metaethics

Since philosophical ethics is often conceived of as a practical branch of philosophy—aiming at providing concrete moral guidance and justifications—metaethics sits awkwardly as a largely abstract enterprise that says little or nothing about real-life moral issues. Indeed, the pressing nature of such issues was part of the general migration back to applied and normative ethics in the politically-galvanized intellectual climate of the 1970s (described above). And yet, moral experience seems to furnish myriad examples of disagreement concerning not merely specific applied issues, or even the interpretations or applications of particular theories, but sometimes about the very place of morality in general within multicultural, secular, and scientific accounts of the world. Thus, one of the issues inherent in metaethics concerns its status vis-à-vis other levels of moral philosophizing.

As a historical fact, metaethical positions have been combined with a variety of first-order moral positions, and vice versa: George Berkeley, John Stuart Mill, G.E. Moore, and R.M. Hare, for instance, were all committed to some form of Utilitarianism as a first-order moral framework, despite advocating radically different metaethical positions. Likewise, in his influential book Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong, J.L. Mackie (1977) defends a form of (second-order) metaethical skepticism or relativism in the first chapter, only to devote the rest of the book to the articulation of a substantive theory of (first-order) Utilitarianism. Metaethical positions would appear then to underdetermine normative theories, perhaps in the same way that normative theories themselves underdetermine applied ethical stances (for example, two equally committed Utilitarians can nonetheless disagree about the moral permissibility of eating meat). Yet, despite the logically possible combinations of second and first-order moral positions, Stephen Darwall (2006: 25) notes that, nevertheless, “there do seem to be affinities between metaethical and roughly corresponding ethical theories,” for example, metaethical naturalists have almost universally tended to be Utilitarians at the first-order level, though not vice versa. Notable exceptions to this tendency—that is, metaethical naturalists who are also first-order deontologists—include Alan Gewirth (1977) and Michael Boylan (1999; 2004). For critical responses to these positions, see Beyleveld (1992), Steigleder (1999), Spence (2006), and Gordon (2009).

Other philosophers envision the connection between metaethics and more concrete moral theorizing in much more intimate ways. For example, Matthew Kramer (2009: 2) has argued that metaethical realism (see section four below) is itself actually a first-order moral view as well, noting that “most of the reasons for insisting on the objectivity of ethics are ethical reasons.” (For a similar view about the first-order “need” to believe in the second-order thesis that moral values are “objective,” see also Ronald Dworkin 1996.) Torbjörn Tännsjö (1990), by contrast, argues that, although metaethics is irrelevant to normative theorizing, it may still be significant in other psychological or pragmatic way, for example, by constraining other beliefs. Nicholas Sturgeon (1986) has claimed that the first-order belief in moral fallibility must be grounded in some second-order metaethical view. And David Wiggins (1976) has suggested that metaethical questions about the ultimate foundation and justification of basic moral beliefs may have deep existential implications for how humans view the question of the meaning of life.

The metaethical question of whether or not moral values are cross-culturally universal would seem to have important implications for how foreign practices are morally evaluated at the first-order level. In particular, metaethical relativism (the view that there are no universal or objective moral values) has been viewed as highly loaded politically and psychologically. Proponents of such relativism often appeal to the alleged open-mindedness and tolerance about first-order moral differences that their second-order metaethical view would seem to support. Conversely, opponents of relativism often appeal to what Thomas Scanlon (1995) has called a “fear of relativism,” citing an anxiety about the first-order effects on our moral convictions and motivations if we become too morally tolerant. (See sections five and eight below for a more detailed discussion of the psychological and political dimensions of metaethics, respectively.) Russ Shafer-Landau (2004) further draws attention to the first-order rhetorical uses of metaethics, for example, Rudolph Giuliani’s evocation of the dangers of metaethical relativism following the terrorist events in the United States on September 11, 2001.

3. Semantic Issues in Metaethics

a. Cognitivism versus Non-Cognitivism

One of the central debates within analytic metaethics concerns the semantics of what is actually going on when people make moral statements such as “Abortion is morally wrong” or “Going to war is never morally justified.” The metaethical question is not necessarily whether such statements themselves are true or false, but whether they are even the sort of sentences that are capable of being true or false in the first place (that is, whether such sentences are “truth-apt”) and, if they are, what it is that makes them “true.” On the surface, such sentences would appear to possess descriptive content—that is, they seem to have the syntactical structure of describing facts in the world—in the same form that the sentence “The cat is on the mat” seems to be making a descriptive claim about a cat on a mat; which, in turn, is true or false depending on whether or not there really is a cat on the mat. To put it differently, the sentence “The cat is on the mat” seems to be expressing a belief about the way the world actually is. The metaethical view that moral statements similarly express truth-apt beliefs about the world is known as cognitivism. Cognitivism would seem to be the default view of our moral discourse given the apparent structure that such discourse appears to have. Indeed, if cognitivism were not true— such that moral sentences were expressing something other than truth-apt propositions—then it would seem to be difficult to account for why we nonetheless are able to make logical inferences from one moral sentence to another. For instance, consider the following argument:

1. It is wrong to lie.

2. If it is wrong to lie, then it is wrong to get one’s sibling to lie.

3. Therefore, it is wrong to get one’s sibling to lie.

This argument seems to be a valid application of the logical rule known as modus ponens. Yet, logical rules such as modus ponens operate only on truth-apt propositions. Thus, because we seem to be able to legitimately apply such a rule in the example above, such moral sentences must be truth-apt. This argument in favor of metaethical cognitivism by appeal to the apparent logical structure of moral discourse is known as the Frege-Geach Problem in honor of the philosophers credited with its articulation (compare, Geach 1960; Geach 1965 credits Frege as an ancestor of this problem; see also Schueler 1988 for an influential analysis of this problem vis-à-vis moral realism). According to proponents of the Frege-Geach Problem, rejecting cognitivism would force us to show the separate occurrences of the sentence “it is wrong to lie” in the above argument as homonymous: according to such non-cognitivists, the occurrence in sentence (1) is an expression of a non-truth-apt sentiment about lying, whereas the occurrence in sentence (2) is not, since it’s only claiming what one would express conditionally. Since this homonymy would seem to threaten to undermine the grammatical structure of moral discourse, non-cognitivism must be rejected.

Despite this argument about the surface appearance of cognitivism, however, numerous metaethicists have rejected the view that moral sentences ultimately express beliefs about the world. A historically influential forerunner of the alternate theory of non-cognitivism can be found in the moral writings of David Hume, who famously argued that moral distinctions are not derived from reason, but instead represent emotional responses. As such, moral sentences express not beliefs which may be true or false, but desires or feelings which are neither true nor false. This Humean position was renewed in twentieth-century metaethics by the observation that not only are moral disputes often heavily affect-laden in a way many other factual disputes are not, but also that the kind of facts which would apparently be necessary to accommodate true moral beliefs would have to be very strange sorts of entities. Specifically, the worry is that, whereas we can appeal to standards of empirical verification or falsification to adjudicate when our non-moral beliefs are true or false, no such standards seem applicable in the moral sphere, since we cannot literally point to moral goodness in the way we can literally point to cats on mats.

In response to this apparent disanalogy between moral and non-moral statements, many metaethicists embraced a sort of neo-Humean non-cognitivism, according to which moral statements express non-truth-apt desires or feelings. The Logical Positivism of the Vienna Circle adopted this metaethical position, finding anything not empirically verifiable to be semantically “meaningless.” Thus, A.J. Ayer (1936) defended what he called metaethical emotivism, according to which moral expressions are indexed always to the speaker’s own affective state. So, the moral utterance “Abortion is morally wrong” would ultimately mean only that “I do not approve of abortion,” or, more accurately (to avoid even the appearance of having descriptive content), “Abortion—boo!” C.L. Stevenson (1944) further developed metaethical non-cognitivism as involving not merely an expression of the speaker’s personal attitude, but also an implicit endorsement of what the speaker thinks the audience ought to feel. R.M. Hare (1982) similarly analyzed moral utterances as containing both descriptive (truth-apt) as well as ineliminably prescriptive elements, such that genuinely asserting, for instance, that murder is wrong involves a concomitant emotional endorsement of not murdering. Drawing on the work of ordinary-language philosophers such as J.L. Austin, Hare distinguished the act of making a statement (that is, the statement’s “illocutionary force”) from other acts that may be performed concomitantly (that is, the statement’s “perlocutionary force”)— as when, for example, stating “I do” in the context of a marriage ceremony thereby effects an actual legal reality. Similarly, Hare argued that in the case of moral language, the illocutionary act of describing a war as “unjust” may, as part and parcel of the description itself, also involve the perlocutionary force of recommending a negative attitude or action with respect to that war. For Hare, the prescriptive dimension of such an assertion must be constrained by the requirements of universalizability—hence, Hare’s metaethical position is referred to as “universal prescriptivism.”

More recently, sophisticated versions of non-cognitivism have flourished that build into moral expression not only the individual speaker’s normative endorsement, but also an appeal to a socially-shared norm that helps contextualize the endorsement. Thus, Alan Gibbard (1990) defends norm-expressivism, according to which moral statements express commitments not to idiosyncratic personal feelings, but instead to the particular (and, for Gibbard, evolutionarily adaptive) cultural mores that enable communication and social coordination.

Non-cognitivists have also attempted to address the Frege-Geach Problem discussed above, by specifying how the expression of attitudes functions in moral discourse. Simon Blackburn (1984), for instance, has famously argued that non-cognitivism is a claim only about the moral, not the logical parts of discourse. Thus, according to Blackburn, to say that “If it is wrong to lie, then it is wrong to get one’s sibling to lie” can be understood as expressing not an attitude toward lying itself (which is couched in merely hypothetical terms), but rather an attitude toward the disposition to express an attitude toward lying (that is, a kind of second-order sentiment). Since this still essentially involves the expression of attitudes rather than truth-apt assertions, it’s still properly a type of non-cognitivism; yet, by distinguishing expressing an attitude directly from expressing an attitude about another (hypothetical) attitude, Blackburn thinks the logical and grammatical structure of our discourse is preserved. Since this view combines the expressive thesis of non-cognitivism with the logical appearance of moral realism, Blackburn dubs it “quasi-realism”. For a critical response to Blackburn’s attempted solution to the Frege-Geach Problem, see Wright (1988). For an accessible survey of the history of the debate surrounding the Frege-Geach Problem, see Schroeder (2008), and for attempts to articulate new hybrid theories that combine elements of both cognitivism as well as non-cognitivism, see Ridge (2006) and Boisvert (2008).

One complication in the ongoing debate between cognitivist versus non-cognitivist accounts of moral language is the growing realization of the difficulty in conceptually distinguishing beliefs from desires in the first place. Recognition of the mingled nature of cognitive and non-cognitive states can arguably be found in Aristotle’s view that how we perceive and conceptualize a situation fundamentally affects how we respond to it emotionally; not to mention Sigmund Freud’s commitment to the idea that our emotions themselves stem ultimately from (perhaps unconscious) beliefs (compare, Neu 2000). Much contemporary metaethical debate between cognitivists and non-cognitivists thus concerns the extent to which beliefs alone, desires alone, or some compound of the two—what J.E.J. Altham (1986) has dubbed “besires”—are capable of capturing the prescriptive and affective dimension that moral discourse seems to evidence (see Theories of Emotions).

b. Theories of Moral Truth

A related issue regarding the semantics of metaethics concerns what it would even mean to say that a moral statement is “true” if some form of cognitivism were correct. The traditional philosophical account of truth (called the correspondence theory of truth) regards a proposition as true just in case it accurately describes the way the world really is independent of the proposition. Thus, the sentence “The cat is on the mat” would be true if and only if there really is a cat who is really on a mat. According to this understanding, moral expressions would similarly have to correspond to external features about the world in order to be true: the sentence “Murder is wrong” would be true in virtue of its correspondence to some “fact” in the world about murder being wrong. And indeed, several metaethical positions (often grouped under the title of “realism” or “objectivism”—see section four below) embrace precisely this view; although exactly what the features of the world are to which allegedly true moral propositions correspond remains a matter of serious debate. However, there are several obvious challenges to this traditional correspondence account of moral truth. For one thing, moral properties such as “wrongness” do not seem to be the sort of entities that can literally be pointed to or picked out by propositions in the same way that cats and mats can be, since the moral properties are not spatial-temporal objects. As David Hume famously put it,

Take any action allow’d to be vicious: Wilful murder, for instance. Examine it in all lights, and see if you can find that matter of fact, or real existence, which you call vice. In which-ever way you take it, you find only certain passions, motives, volitions and thoughts. There is no other matter of fact in the case. (Hume 1740: 468)

Other possible ontological models for what moral “facts” might look like are considered in section four below. In later years, however, several alternative philosophical understandings of truth have proliferated which might allow moral expressions to be “true” without requiring any correspondence to external facts per se. Many of these new theories of moral truth hearken to a suggestion by Ludwig Wittgenstein in the early twentieth-century that the meaning of any term is determined by how that term is actually used in discourse. Building on this insight about meaning, Frank Ramsey (1927) extended the account to truth itself. Thus, according to Ramsey, the predicate “is true” does not stand for a property per se, but rather functions as a kind of abbreviation for the indirect assertion of other propositions. For instance, Ramsey suggested that to utter the proposition “The cat is on the mat” is to say the same thing as “The sentence ‘the cat is on the mat’ is true.” The phrase “is true” in the latter utterance adds nothing semantically to what is expressed in the former, since in uttering the former, the speaker is already affirming that the cat is on the mat. This is an instance of the so-called disquotational schema, that is, the view that truth is already implicit in a sentence without the addition of the phrase “is true.” Ramsey wielded this principle to defend a deflationary theory of truth, wherein truth predicates are stripped of any metaphysically substantial property, and reduced instead merely to the ability to be formally represented in a language. Saying that truth is thus stripped of metaphysics is not to say that it is determined by usage in an arbitrary or unprincipled way. This is because, while the deflationary theory defines “truth” merely as the ability to be represented in a language, there are always syntactic rules that a language must follow. The grammar of a language thus constrains what can be properly expressed in that language, and therefore (on the deflationary theory) what can be true. Deflationary truth is in this way constrained by what may be called “warranted assertibility,” and since deflationary truth just is what can be expressed by the grammar of a language, we can say more strongly that truth is warranted assertibility.

Hilary Putnam (1981) has articulated an influential challenge to the deflationary account. He argues that deflationary truth is unable to accommodate the fact that we normally think of truth as eternal and stable. But if truth just is warranted assertibility (or what Putnam calls “rational acceptability”), then it becomes mutable since warranted assertibility varies depending on what information is available. For instance, the proposition “the Earth is flat” could have been asserted with warrant (that is, accepted rationally) a thousand years ago in a way that it could not be today because we now have more information available about the Earth. But, though warranted assertibility changed in this case, we wouldn’t want to say that the truth of the proposition “the Earth is flat” changed. Based on these problems, philosophers like Putnam refine the deflationary theory by substituting a condition of ideal warrant or justification, that is, where warranted assertibility is not relative to what specific information a speaker may have at a specific moment, but to what information would be accessible to an ideal epistemic agent. What kind of information would such an ideal speaker have? Putnam characterizes the ideal epistemic situation as involving information that is both complete (that is, involving everything relevant) and consistent (that is, not logically contradictory). These two conditions combine to affect a convergence of information for the ideal agent— a view Putnam calls “internal realism.”

This tradition of deflating truth—of what Jamie Dreier has described as “sucking the substance out of heavy-duty metaphysical concepts” (Dreier 2004: 26)—has received careful exposition in recent years by Crispin Wright. Wright (1992) defends a theory of truth he calls “minimalism.” Though indebted in fundamental ways to the tradition—from Wittgenstein to Ramsey to Putnam—discussed above, Wright’s position differs importantly from these accounts. Wright agrees with Putnam’s criticism of traditional deflationary theories of truth, namely that they make truth too variable by identifying it with something as mutable as warranted assertibility. However, Wright disagrees with Putnam that truth is constrained by the convergence of information that would be available to an epistemically ideal agent. This is because Wright thinks that it is apparent to speakers of a language that something may be true even if it is not justified in ideal epistemic conditions. Wright calls this apparentness a “platitude.” Platitudes, says Wright, are what ordinary language users pre-theoretically mean, and Wright identifies several specific platitudes we have concerning truth, for example, that a statement can be true without being justified, that truth-apt propositions have negations that are also thereby truth-apt, and so forth. Such platitudes serve the same purpose of checking and balancing truth that warranted assertibility or ideal convergence served in the theories of Ramsey and Putnam (Wright calls this check and balance “superassertability”). As Wright puts it, “If an interpretation of “true” satisfies these platitudes, there is, for minimalism, no further, metaphysical question whether it captures a concept worth regarding as truth” (1992: 34). Wright’s theory of minimalist truth has been extraordinarily influential in metaethics, particularly by non-cognitivists eager to accommodate some of the logical structure that moral discourse apparently evidences, but without viewing moral utterances as expressing beliefs that must literally correspond to facts. Such a non-cognitivist theory of minimalist moral truth is defended by Simon Blackburn (1993), who characterizes the resultant view as “quasi-realism” (as discussed in section 3a above). For a critical discussion of the extent to which non-cognitivist views such as Blackburn’s quasi-realism can leverage Wright’s theory of minimalism, see the debate between Michael Smith (1994) and John Divers and Alexander Miller (1994).

4. Ontological Issues in Metaethics

a. Moral Realisms

If moral truth is understood in the traditional sense of corresponding to reality, what sort of features of reality could suffice to accommodate this correspondence? What sort of entity is “wrongness” or “goodness” in the first place? The branch of philosophy that deals with the way in which things exist is called “ontology”, and metaethical positions may also be divided according to how they envision the ontological status of moral values. Perhaps the biggest schism within metaethics is between those who claim that there are moral facts that are “real” or “objective” in the sense that they exist independently of any beliefs or evidence about them, versus those who think that moral values are not belief-independent “facts” at all, but are instead created by individuals or cultures in sometimes radically different ways. Proponents of the former view are called realists or objectivists; proponents of the latter view are called relativists or subjectivists.

Realism / objectivism is often defended by appeal to the normative or political implications of believing that there are universal moral truths that transcend what any individual or even an entire culture might think about them (see sections two and eight). Realist positions, however, disagree about what precisely moral values are if they are causally independent from human belief or culture. According to some realists, moral values are abstract properties that are “objective” in the same sense that geometrical or mathematical properties might be thought to be objective. For example, it might be thought that the sentence “Dogs are canines” is true in a way that is independent from what humans think about it, without thereby believing that there is a literal, physical thing called “dogs”— for, dogs-in-general (rather than a particular dog, say, Fido) is an abstract concept. Some moral realists envision moral values as real without being physical in precisely this way; and because of the similarity between this view and Plato’s famous Theory of Forms, such moral realists are also sometimes called moral Platonists. According to such realists, moral values are real without being reducible to any other kinds of properties or facts: moral values instead, according to these realists, are ontologically unique (or sui generis) and irreducible to other kinds of properties. Proponents of this type of Platonist or sui generis version of moral realism include G.E. Moore (1903), W.D. Ross (1930), W.D. Hudson (1967), Iris Murdoch (1970, arguably), and Russ Shafer-Landau (2003). Tom Regan (1986) also discusses the effect of this metaethical position on the general intellectual climate of the fin de siècle movement known as the Bloomsbury Group.

Other moral realists, though, conceive of the ontology of moral properties in much more concrete terms. According to these realists, moral properties such as “goodness” are not purely abstract entities, but are always instead realized and embodied in particular physical states of affairs. These moral realists often draw analogies between moral properties and scientific properties such as gravity, velocity, mass, and so forth. These scientific concepts are commonly thought to exist independent of what we think about them, and yet they are not part of an ontologically distinct world of pure, abstract ideas in the way that Plato envisioned. So too might moral properties ultimately be reducible to scientific features of the world in a way that preserves their objectivity. An early proponent of such a naturalistic view is arguably Aristotle himself, who anchored his ethics to an understanding of what biologically makes human life flourish. For a later Aristotelian moral realism, see Paul Bloomfield (2001). However, for questions about the extent to which Aristotelianism can truly pair with moral realism, see Robert Heinaman (1995). Note also that several other metaethicists who share broadly Aristotelian conceptions of human needs and human flourishing nonetheless reject realism, arguing that even a shared human nature still essentially locates moral values in human sensibility rather than in some trans-human moral reality. For examples of such naturalistic moral relativism, see Philippa Foot (2001) and David B. Wong (2006). Similar claims about the ineliminable roles that human sensibility and language play in constituting moral reality have looked less to Aristotle and more to Wittgenstein; although, as with the former, there may be some discomfort allowing views that closely link morality with human sensibilities to be called genuinely “realist.” For examples, see in particular David Wiggins (1976) and Sabina Lovibond (1983). Other notable theorists who have advanced Wittgensteinian accounts of the constitutive role that language and context play in our understanding of morality include G.E.M. Anscombe (1958) and Alasdair MacIntyre (1981), although both are explicitly agnostic about whether this commits them to moral realism or relativism.

The naturalistic tradition of moral realism is continued by contemporary theorists such as Alan Gewirth (1980), Deryck Beyleveld (1992), and Michael Boylan (2004) who similarly seek to ground moral objectivity in certain universal features of humans. Unlike Aristotelian appeals to our biological and social nature, however, these theorists adopt a Kantian stance, which appeals to the capacities and requirements of rational agency—for example, what Gewirth has called “the principle of generic consistency.” While these neo-Kantian theories are more focused on questions about the justification of moral beliefs rather than on the existence of belief-independent values or properties, they may nonetheless be classed as moral realisms in light of their commitment to the objective and universal nature of rationality. For commentary and discussion of such theories, see in particular Steigleder (1999), Boylan (1999), Spence (2006), and Gordon (2009).

Other naturalistic theories have looked to scientific models of property reductionism as a way of understanding moral realism. In the same way that, for instance, our commonsense understanding of “water” refers to a property that, at the scientific level, just is H₂O, so too might moral values be reduced to non-moral properties. And, since these non-moral properties are real entities, the resultant view about the values that reduce to them can be considered a form of moral realism—without any need to posit trans-scientific, other-worldly Platonic entities. This general approach to naturalistic realism is often referred to as “Cornell Realism” in light of the fact that several of its prominent advocates studied or taught at Cornell University. Geoff Sayre-McCord (1988) has also famously dubbed it “New Wave Moral Realism.” Individual proponents of such a view may have divergent views concerning how the alleged “reduction” of the moral to the non-moral works precisely. Richard Boyd (1988), for instance, defends the view that the reductive relationship between moral and non-moral properties is a priori and necessary, but not thereby singular; moral properties might instead reduce to a “homeostatic cluster” of different overlapping non-moral properties.

Several other notable examples of scientifically-minded naturalistic moral realism have been defended. Nicholas Sturgeon (1988) has similarly argued in favor of a reduction of moral to non-moral properties, while emphasizing that a reduction at the level of the denotation or extension of our moral terms need not entail a corresponding reduction at the level of the connotation or intension of how we talk about morality. In other words, we can affirm that values just are (sets of) natural properties without thereby thinking we can or should abandon our moral language or explanatory/justificatory processes. David Brink (1989) has articulated a similar type of naturalistic moral realism which emphasizes the epistemological and motivational aspects of Cornell Realism by defending a coherentist account of justification and an externalist theory of motivation, respectively. Peter Railton (1986) has also offered a version of naturalistic moral realism according to which moral properties are reduced to non-moral properties; however, the non-moral properties in question are not so much scientific properties (or clusters of such properties), but are instead constituted by the “objective interests” of ideal epistemic agents or “impartial spectators.” Yet another variety of naturalistic moral realism has been put forward by Frank Jackson and Philip Pettit (1995). According to their view of “analytic moral functionalism,” moral properties are reducible to “whatever plays their role in mature folk morality.” Jackson’s (1998) refinement of this position—which he calls “analytic descriptivism”—elaborates that the “mature folk” properties to which moral properties are reducible will be “descriptive predicates” (although Jackson allows for the possibility that these descriptive predicates need not be physical or even scientific).

A helpful way to understand the differences between all these varieties of moral realism—namely, the Platonic versus the naturalistic versions— is by appeal to a famous argument advanced by G.E. Moore at the beginning of twentieth-century metaethics. Moore—himself an advocate of the Platonic view of morality—argued that moral properties such as “good” cannot be solely defined by scientific, natural properties such as “biological flourishing” or “social coordination” for the simple reason that, given such an alleged definition, we could still always sensibly ask whether such scientific properties were themselves truly good or not. The apparent ability to always keep the moral status of any scientific or natural thing an “open question” led Moore to reject any analysis of morality that defined moral values as anything other than simply “moral,” period. Any attempt to violate this ban must result, Moore believed, in the committing of a “naturalistic fallacy.” Moral Platonists or non-naturalistic realists tend to view Moore’s Open Question Argument as persuasive. Naturalistic realists, by contrast, argue that Moore’s argument is unconvincing on the grounds that not all truths— moral or otherwise— necessarily need to be true solely by definition. After all, such realists will argue, scientific statements such as “Water is H₂O” is true even though people can (and did for a long time) question this definition.

Michael Smith (1994) has referred to this realist strategy of defining moral properties as naturalistic properties which humans discover, rather than which are simply true by definition, as “synthetic ethical naturalism.” One argument against this form of moral realism has been developed by Terry Horgan and Mark Timmons (1991), on the basis of a thought-experiment called Moral Twin Earth. This thought-experiment asks us to imagine two different worlds, the actual Earth as we know it and an alternate-reality Earth in which the same moral terms as those on the actual Earth are used to refer to the same natural/scientific properties (as the naturalistic moral realist wants to say). However, Horgan and Timmons point out that we can at the same time imagine that the moral terms on our actual Earth refer to, say, properties that maximize overall happiness (as Utilitarianism maintains), while also imagining that the moral terms used on hypothetical Moral Twin Earth refer to properties of universal rationality (as Kantian normative theorists maintain). But this would show that the moral terms used on actual Earth versus those used on Moral Twin Earth have different meanings, because they refer to different normative theories. This implies that it would be the normative theories themselves that are causing the difference in the meaning of the moral terms, not the natural properties since those are identical across the two worlds. And since naturalistic (a.k.a. Cornell) moral realism maintains that moral properties are identical at some level to natural properties, Horgan and Timmons think this thought-experiment disproves naturalistic realism. In other words, if the naturalistic realists were correct about the reduction of moral to non-moral predicates, then the Earthlings and Twin Earthlings would have to be interpreted not as genuinely disagreeing about morality, but as instead talking past one another altogether; and, according to Horgan and Timmons, this would be highly counter-intuitive, since it seems on the surface that the two parties are truly disagreeing.

Centrally at issue in the Moral Twin Earth argument is the question of how precisely naturalistic realists envision moral properties being “reduced” to natural, scientific properties in the first place. Such realists frequently invoke the metaphysical relationship of supervenience to account for the way that moral properties might connect to scientific properties. For one property or set of properties to supervene on another means that any change in one must necessarily result in a corresponding change in the other. For instance, to say that the color property of greenness supervenes on grass is to say that if two plots of grass are identical in all biological, scientific ways, then they will be green in exactly the same way too. Simon Blackburn (1993: 111-129), however, has raised a serious objection to using this notion to explain moral supervenience. Blackburn claims that if moral properties did supervene on natural properties, then we should be able to imagine two different worlds (akin to Horgan and Timmons’ Moral Twin Earth) where killing is morally wrong in one world, but not wrong in the other world— all we would have to do is imagine two worlds in which the natural, scientific facts were different. And if we can coherently imagine these two worlds, then there is no reason why we should not also be able to imagine a third “mixed” world in which killing is sometimes wrong and sometimes not. But Blackburn does not think we can in fact imagine such a strange morally mixed world— for, he believes that it is part of our conception of morality that moral wrongness or rightness does not just change haphazardly from case to case, all things being equal. As Blackburn says, “While I cannot see an inconsistency in holding this belief [namely, the view that moral propositions report factual states of affairs upon which the moral properties supervene in an irreducible way], it is not philosophically very inviting. Supervenience becomes, for the realist, an opaque, isolated, logical fact for which no explanation can be proffered” (1993: 119). In this way, Blackburn is not objecting to the supervenience relation per se, but rather to attempts to leverage this relation in favor of moral realism. For a critical examination of supervenience in principle, see Kim (1990); Blackburn attempts to refurbish his notion of supervenience in response to Kim’s critique in Blackburn (1993: 130-148).

Apart from the debate between naturalistic versus non-naturalistic moral realists, some metaethicists have explored the possibility that moral properties might be “real” without needing to be fully independent from human sensibility. According to these theories of moral realism, moral values might be akin to so-called “dispositional properties.” A dispositional property (sometimes understood as a “secondary quality”) is envisioned as a sort of latent potential or disposition, inherent in some external object or state of affairs, that becomes activated or actualized through involvement on the part of some other object or state of affairs. Thus, for example, the properties of being fragile or looking red are thought to involve a latent disposition to break under certain conditions or to appear red in a certain light. The suggestion that moral values might be similarly dispositional was made famous by John McDowell (1985). According to this view, moral properties such as “goodness” can still be real at the level of dispositional possibility (in the same way that glass is still fragile even when it is not breaking, or that blood is red even in the darkness), while still only being expressible by reference to the features (actual moral agents, in the case of morality) that would actualize those dispositions. For similar metaethical positions that seek to articulate a model of moral values which are objective, yet relational to aspects of human sensibility, see David Wiggins (1976), Sabina Lovibond (1983), David McNaughton (1988), Mark Platts (1991), Jonathan Dancy (2000), and DeLapp (2009). Arguments against this form of dispositional moral realism typically attempt to leverage alleged disanalogies between moral properties and other, non-moral dispositional properties (see especially Blackburn 1993).

b. Moral Relativisms

Other metaethical positions reject altogether the idea that moral values— whether naturalistic, non-naturalistic, or dispositional—are real or objective in the sense of being independent from human belief or culture in the first place. Such positions instead insist on the fundamentally anthropocentric nature of morality. According to such views, moral values are not “out there” in the world (whether as scientific properties, dispositional properties, or Platonic Forms) at all, but are created by human perspectives and needs. Since these perspectives and needs can vary from person to person or from culture to culture, these metaethical theories are usually referred to as either “subjectivism” or “relativism” (sometimes moral nihilism as well; although, this is a more normatively loaded term). Many of the reasons in favor of metaethical relativism concern either a rejection of the realist ontological models discussed above, or else by appeal to psychological, epistemological, or anthropological considerations (see sections 5, 6, 7 below).

Most forms of metaethical relativism envision moral values as constructed for different, and sometimes incommensurable human purposes such as social coordination, and so forth. This view is explicitly endorsed by Gilbert Harman (1975), but may also be implicitly associated in different ways with any position that conceives of moral value as constructed by divine commands (Adams 1987; see also Divine Command Theory), idealized human rationality (Korsgaard 1996) or perspective (Firth 1952), or a social contract between competing interests (Scanlon 1982; Copp 2007). For this reason, the view is also sometimes known as moral constructivism (compare, Shafer-Landau 2003: 39-52). Furthermore, metaethical relativism must be distinguished from the non-cognitivist metaethical views considered above in section three. Non-cognitivism is a semantic thesis about what moral utterances mean—namely, that moral utterances are neither true nor false at all, but instead express prescriptive endorsements or norms. Metaethical subjectivism/relativism/constructivism, by contrast, acknowledges the semantic accuracy of cognitivism—according to which moral utterances are either true or false— but insists that such utterances are always, as it happens, false. That is, metaethical subjectivism/relativism/constructivism is a thesis about the (lack of) moral facts in the world, not a thesis about what we humans are doing when we try to talk about such facts. And since metaethical subjectivism/relativism/constructivism thinks that our cognitivist moral language is systematically false, it may also be known as moral error theory (Mackie 1977) or moral fictionalism (Kalderon 2005).

Although metaethical relativism is often depicted as embracing a valueless world of moral free-for-all, more sophisticated versions of the theory have attempted to place certain boundaries on morality in a way that still affirms the fundamental human-centeredness of values. Thus, David B. Wong (1984; 2006) has defended a view he calls pluralistic moral relativism according to which moral values are constructed differently by different social groups for different purposes; but in such a way that the degree of relativity will be nonetheless constrained by a generally uniform biological account of human nature and flourishing. A similar conception of metaethical relativism that is nonetheless grounded in some notion of universal human biological characteristics may be found in Philippa Foot (2001).

5. Psychology and Metaethics

One of the most pressing questions within analytic metaethics concerns how morality engages our embodied human psychologies. Specifically, how (if at all) do moral judgments move us to act in accordance with them? Is there any reason to be moral for its own sake, and can we give any psychologically persuasive reasons to others to act morally if they do not already acknowledge such reasons? Is it part of the definition of moral concepts such as “right” and “wrong” that they should or should not be pursued, or is it possible to know that, say, murder is morally wrong, but nonetheless not recognize any reason not to murder?

a. Motivation and Moral Reasons

Those who argue that the psychological motivation to act morally is already implicit in the judgment that something is morally good, are commonly called motivational internalists. Motivational internalists may further be divided into weak motivational internalists or strong motivational internalists, according to the strength of the motivation that they think true moral judgments come pre-packaged with. Thus, the Socratic view that evil is always performed out of ignorance (for no one, goes the argument, would knowingly do something that would morally damage their own character or soul) may be seen as a type of strong motivational internalism. Weaker versions of motivational internalism may insist only that moral judgments supply their own impetus to act accordingly, but that this impetus can (and perhaps often does) get overruled by countervailing motivational forces. Thus, Aristotle’s famous account of “weakness of the will” has been interpreted as a weaker sort of motivational internalism, according to which a person may recognize that something is morally right, and may even want at some level to do what is right, but is nonetheless lured away from such action, perhaps through stronger temptations.

Apart from what actually motivates people to act in accordance with their moral judgments, however, there is the somewhat different question about whether such judgments also supply their own intrinsic reasons to act in accordance with them. Reasons-externalists assert that sincerely judging that something is morally wrong, for instance, automatically supplies a reason for the judger that would justify her acting on the basis of that judgment, that is, a reason that is external to or independent of what the judger herself feels or wants. This need not mean that such a justification is an objectively adequate justification (that would hinge on whether one was a realist or relativist about metaethics), only that it would make sense as a response to the question “Why did you do that?” to say “Because I judged that it was morally right” (compare, McDowell 1978; Shafer-Landau 2003). According to reasons-internalists, however, judging and justifying are two conceptually different matters, such that someone could make a legitimate judgment that an action was morally wrong and still fail to recognize any reason that would justify their not performing it. Instead, sufficiently justifying moral reasons must exist independently and internally to a person’s psychological makeup (compare, Foot 1972; Williams 1979).

Closely related to the debates between internalism and externalism is the question of the metaethical status of alleged psychopaths or sociopaths. According to some moral psychologists, such individuals are characterized by a failure to distinguish moral values from merely conventional values. Several metaethicists have pointed to the apparent existence of psychopaths as support for the truth of either motivational or reasons-externalism; since psychopaths seem to be able to judge that, for instance, murder or lying are morally wrong, but either feel little or no motivation to refrain from these things, or else do not recognize any reason that should justify refraining from these things. Motivational internalists and reasons-externalists, however, have also sought to accommodate the challenge presented by the psychopath, for example, by arguing that the psychopath does not truly, robustly know that what she is doing is wrong, but only knows how to use the word “wrong” in roughly the way that the rest of society does.

A separate issue related to the internalist/externalist debate concerns the apparent psychological uniqueness of moral judgments. Specifically, at least according to the motivational internalist and reasons-externalist, moral judgments are supposed to supply, respectively, their own inherent motivations or justifying reasons, that is, their own intrinsic quality of “to-be-pursuedness.” Yet, this would seem to render morality suspiciously unique—or what J.L. Mackie (1977) calls “metaphysically queer”— since all other, non-moral judgments (for example, scientific, factual, or perceptual judgments) do not seem to provide any inherent motivations or justifications. The objection is not that non-moral judgments (for example, “This coffee is decaffeinated”) supply no motivational or justificatory force, but merely that any such motivation or justificatory force hinges on other psychological factors independent of the judgment itself (that is, the judgment about the coffee being decaffeinated will only motivate or provide a reason for you to drink it if you already have the desire to avoid caffeine). Unlike the factual judgment about the coffee, though, the moral judgment that an action is wrong is supposed to be motivating or reasons-giving regardless of the judger’s personal desires or interests. Motivational internalists or reasons-externalists have responded to this alleged “queerness” by either embracing the uniqueness of moral judgments, or else by attempting to articulate other examples of non-moral judgments which might also inherently supply motivation or reasons.

b. Experimental Metaethics

Not only has psychology been of interest to metaethicists, but metaethics has also been of interest to psychologists. The movement known as experimental philosophy (compare, Appiah 2008; Knobe and Nichols 2008)— which seeks to supplement theoretical philosophical claims with empirical attention to how people actually think and act— has yielded numerous suggestive findings about a variety of metaethical positions. For example, drawing on empirical research in social psychology, several philosophers have suggested that moral judgments, motivations, and evaluations are highly sensitive to situational variables in a way that might challenge the universality or autonomy of morality (Flanagan 1991; Doris 2002). Other moral psychologists have explored the possibilities of divergences in moral reasoning and valuation with respect to gender (Gilligan 1982), ethnicity (Markus and Kitayama 1991; Miller and Bersoff 1992), and political affiliation (McCrae 1992; Haidt 2007).

The specific debate between metaethical realism and relativism has also recently been examined from experimental perspectives. It has been argued that an empirically-informed analysis of people’s actual metaethical commitments (such as they are) is needed as a check and balance on the many frequent appeals to “commonsense morality” or “ordinary moral experience.” Realists as well as relativists have often used such appeals as a means of locating a burden of proof for or against their theories, but the actual experimental findings about lay-people’s metaethical intuitions remain mixed. For examples of realists assuming folk realism, see Brink (1989: 25), Smith (1994: 5), and Shafer-Landau (2003: 23); for examples of relativists assuming folk relativism, see Harman (1985); and for examples of relativists assuming folk realism, see Mackie (1977) and Joyce (2001: 70). William James (1896: 14) offered an early psychological description of humans as “absolutists by instinct,” although James’ specific metaethical commitments remain unclear (compare, Suckiel 1982). On the one hand, Shaun Nichols (2004) has argued that metaethical relativism is particularly pronounced among college undergraduates. On the other hand, William Rottschaefer (1999) has argued instead that moral realism is empirically supported by attention to effective child-rearing practices.

c. Moral Emotions

Another psychological topic that has been of interest to metaethicists is the nature and significance of moral emotions. One aspect of this debate has been the perennial question of whether it is fundamentally rationality which supplies our moral distinctions and motivations, or whether these are instead generated or conditioned by passions and sentiments which are separate from reason. (See section 5a above for more on this debate.) In particular, this debate was one of the dividing issues in eighteenth-century ethics between the so-called Intellectualist School (for example, Ralph Cudworth, William Wollaston, and so forth), which stressed the rational grasp of certain “moral fitnesses” on the one hand, and the Sentimentalist School (for example, Shaftesbury, David Hume, and so forth), which stressed the role played by our non-cognitive “moral sense” on the other hand (compare, Selby-Bigge 1897; see also Darwall 1995 for an application of these views to contemporary metaethical debates about moral motivation and knowledge).

Aside from motivational and epistemological issues, however, moral emotions have been of interest to metaethicists in terms of the apparent phenomenology they furnish. In particular, attention has been given to which metaethical theory, if any, better accommodates the existence of self-regarding “retributive emotions,” such as guilt, regret, shame, and remorse. Martha Nussbaum (1986) and Bernard Williams (1993), for example, have drawn compelling attention to the powerful emotional responses characteristic of Greek tragedy, and the so-called moral luck that such experiences seem to involve. According to Williams (1965), sensitivity to moral dilemmas will reveal a picture of the moral sphere according to which even the best-intentioned actions may leave moral “stains” or “remainders” on our character. Michael Stocker (1990) extends this analysis of moral emotions to more general scenarios of ineliminable conflicts between values, and Kevin DeLapp (2009) explores the specific implications of tragic emotions for theories of moral realism. By contrast, Gilbert Harman (2009) has argued against the moral (let alone metaethical) significance of guilt feelings. Patricia Greenspan (1995), however, has leveraged the phenomenology of guilt (particularly as she identifies it in cases of unavoidable wrong-doing) as a defense of moral realism. For more perspectives on the nature and significance of moral dilemmas, see Gowans (1987). For more on the philosophy of emotions in general, see Calhoun & Solomon (1984).

6. Epistemological Issues in Metaethics

Analytic metaethics also explores questions of how we make moral judgments in the first place, and how (if at all) we are able to know moral truths. The field of moral epistemology can be divided into questions about what moral knowledge is, how moral beliefs can be justified, and where moral knowledge comes from.

a. Thick and Thin Moral Concepts

Moral epistemology explores the contours of moral knowledge itself—not the specific content of individual moral beliefs, but the conceptual characteristics of moral beliefs as a general epistemic category. Here, one of the biggest questions concerns whether moral knowledge involves claims about generic moral values such “goodness” or “wrongness” (so-called “thin” moral concepts) or whether moral knowledge may be obtained at the somewhat more concrete level of concepts such as “courage”, “intemperance”, or “compassion” (which seem to have a “thicker” descriptive content). The general methodology of the thick-thin distinction was popularized by Clifford Geertz (1973) following the introduction of the terminology by Gilbert Ryle (1968). Its specific application to metaethics, however, is due largely to Bernard Williams’ (1985) famous argument that genuine (that is, action-guiding) moral knowledge can only exist at the thicker level of concrete moral concepts. This represents what Williams called the “limits of philosophy,” since philosophical theorizing aims instead at more abstract, thin moral principles. Furthermore, according to Williams, this epistemological point about the thickness of moral knowledge has important implications for the ontology of moral values; namely, Williams defends a kind metaethical relativism on the grounds that, even if thin moral concepts such as “goodness” are universal across different societies, the more specific thick concepts that he thinks really matter to us morally are specified in often divergent ways, for example, two societies that both praise “goodness” may nonetheless have quite different understandings of what counts as “bravery”.

Emphasis on thick moral concepts has been prevalent in virtue ethics in general. For example, Alasdair MacIntyre (1984) has famously defended the neo-Aristotelian view that ethics must be grounded in a “tradition” that is coherent and stable enough to thickly specify virtues and virtuous role-models. Indeed, part of the challenge that MacIntyre sees facing contemporary societies is that increased cross-cultural interconnectedness has fomented a fragmentation of traditional virtue frameworks, engendering a moral cacophony that threatens to undermine moral motivation, knowledge, and even our confidence in what counts as “rational” (MacIntyre 1988). More recently, David B. Wong (2000) has offered a contemporary Confucian response to MacIntyre-style worries about moral fragmentation in democratic societies, arguing that pluralistic societies may still retain a coherent tradition in the form of civic “rituals” such as voting.

A related metaethical issue concerns the scope of moral judgments and the extent to which such judgments may ever legitimately be made universally or whether they ought instead to be indexed to particular situations or contexts; this view is commonly known as moral particularism (compare, Hooker and Little 2000; Dancy 2006).

b. Moral Justification and Explanation

Metaethical positions may also be divided according to how they envision the requirements of justifying moral beliefs. Traditional philosophical accounts of epistemological justification are requisitioned and modified specifically to accommodate moral knowledge. A popular version of a theory of moral-epistemic justification may be called metaethical foundationalism—the view that moral beliefs are epistemically justified by appeal to other moral beliefs, until this justificatory process terminates at some bedrock beliefs whose own justifications are “self-evident.” By contrast, metaethical coherentism requires for the epistemic justification of a moral belief only that it be part of a network of other beliefs, all of which are jointly consistent (compare, Sayre-McCord 1985; Brink 1989). Mark Timmons (1996) also defends a form of metaethical contextualism, according to which justification is determined either by reference to some relevant set of epistemic practices and norms (a view Timmons calls “normative contextualism” and which also bears strong similarity with the movement known as virtue epistemology), or else by reference to some more basic beliefs (a view Timmons calls “structural contextualism” and which seems very similar to foundationalism). Kai Nielsen (1997) has offered another account of contextualist ethical justification with reference to internal systems of religious belief and explanation (see Religious Epistemology).

Early 21^st century work in metaethics has gone into exploring precisely what is involved in the “self-evidence” envisioned by foundationalist accounts of moral justification. Roger Crisp (2002) notes that most historical deployments of “self-evidence” in moral epistemology tended to associate it with obviousness or certainty. For instance, the ethical intuitionism of much of the early part of the 20^th century (particularly following Moore’s Open Question Argument, as discussed above) tended to adopt this stance toward moral truths (compare, Stratton-Lake 2002). It was this understanding of metaethical foundationalism which led J.L. Mackie (1977) to object to what he saw as the “epistemological queerness” of realist or objectivist ontology. In later years, though, more sophisticated versions of metaethical foundationalism have sought interpretations of the “self-evidence” of basic, justifying moral beliefs in a way that need not involve dogmatic or naive assumptions of obviousness; but might instead require only that such basic moral beliefs are epistemically justified non-inferentially (Audi 1999; Shafer-Landau 2003). One candidate for what it might mean for a moral belief to be epistemically justified non-inferentially has involved an appeal to the model of perceptual beliefs (Blum 1991; DeLapp 2007). Non-moral perceptual beliefs are typically viewed as decisive vis-à-vis justification, provided the perceiver is in appropriate, reliable perceptual conditions. In other words, according to this view, the belief “There is a coffee mug in front of me” is epistemically justified just in case one takes oneself to be perceiving a coffee mug and provided that one is not suffering from hallucinations, merely using one’s peripheral vision, or in a dark room. (See also epistemology of perception.)

Although not addressing this issue of moral perception, Russ Shafer-Landau (2003) has argued on a related note that, ultimately, the difference between metaethical naturalism versus non-naturalism (as described in section 4a) might not be so much ontological or metaphysical, as it is epistemological. Specifically, according to Shafer-Landau, metaethical naturalists are those who require that the epistemic justification of moral beliefs be inferred on the basis of other non-moral beliefs about the natural world; whereas metaethical non-naturalists allow for the epistemic justification of moral beliefs to be terminated with some brute moral beliefs that are themselves sui generis.

Aside from the questions of the scope, source, and justification of moral beliefs, another epistemological facet of metaethics concerns the explanatory role that putative moral properties play with respect to moral beliefs. A useful way to frame this issue is by reference to Roderick Chisholm’s (1981) influential point about direct attribution. Chisholm noted that we refer to external things by attributing properties to them directly. Using this language, we may frame the metaethical question as whether or not our attribution of moral properties to actions, characters, and so forth, is “direct” (that is, external). Gilbert Harman (1977) has famously argued that our attribution of moral properties is not direct in this way. According to Harman, objective moral properties, if they existed, would be explanatorily impotent, in the sense that our specific, first-order moral beliefs can already be sufficiently accounted for by appealing to naturalistic, psychological, or perceptual factors. For example, if we were to witness people gleefully torturing a defenseless animal, we would likely form the belief that their action is morally wrong; but, according to Harman, we could adequately explain this moral evaluation solely by citing various sociological, emotional, behavioral, and perceptual causal factors, without needing to posit any mysterious additional properties that our evaluation is also channeling. This explanatory impotence, Harman believes, constitutes a serious disanalogy between, on the one hand, the role that abstract metaethical properties play in actual (first-order) moral judgments and, on the other hand, the role that theoretical scientific entities play in actual (first-order) perceptual judgments. For example, imagine that we were witnessing the screen-representation of a particle accelerator, instead of people torturing an animal. Although we do not literally see a subatomic particle on the screen (rather, we see a bunch of pixels which we interpret as referring to a subatomic particle) any more than we literally see “wrongness” floating around the animal-torturers, the essential difference between the two cases is that the additional abstract belief that there really are subatomic particles is necessary to explain why we infer them on the basis of screen-pixels; whereas, according to Harman, the alleged property of objective “wrongness” is unnecessary to explain why we disapprove of torture. Nicholas Sturgeon (1988), however, has argued contrary to Harman that second-order metaethical properties do play legitimate explanatory roles, for the simple reason that they are cited in people’s justification of why they find the torturing of animals morally wrong. Thus, for Sturgeon, what will count as the “best explanation” of a phenomenon—namely, the phenomenon of morally condemning the torturing of an animal—must be understood in the broader context of our overall explanatory goals, one of which will be to make sense of why we think that torturing animals is objectively wrong in the first place.

7. Anthropological Considerations

Although much of analytic metaethics concerns rarified debates that can often be highly abstracted from actual, applied moral concerns, several metaethical positions have also drawn heavily on cultural anthropological considerations to motivate or flesh-out their views. After all, as discussed above in section one, it has often been actual, historical moments of cultural instability or diversity that have stimulated metaethical reflection on the nature and status of moral values.

a. Cross-Cultural Differences

One of the most influential anthropological aspects of metaethics concerns the apparent challenge that pervasive and persistent cross-cultural moral disagreement would seem to present for moral realists or objectivists. If, as the realist envisions, moral values were truly universal and objective, then why is it the case that so many different people seem to have such drastically different convictions about what is right and wrong? The more plausible explanation of the fact that people persistently disagree about moral matters, so the argument goes, is simply that there are no objective moral truths capable of settling their dispute. As opposed to the apparent convergence in other, non-moral realms of dispute (for example, scientific, perceptual, and so forth), moral disagreement seems both ubiquitous and largely resistant to rational adjudication. J.L. Mackie (1977) leverages these features of moral disagreement to motivate what he calls The Argument from Relativity. This argument begins with the descriptive, anthropological observation that different cultures endorse different moral values and practices, and then argues as an inference to the most likely explanation of this fact that metaethical relativism best accounts for such cross-cultural discrepancies.

Mackie refers to such cross-cultural moral differences as “well-known” and, indeed, it seems prima facie obvious that different cultures have different practices. Mackie’s argument, however, seeks a diversity of practices that is not merely descriptively different on the surface, but that is deeply morally different, if not ultimately incommensurable. James Rachels (1986) describes the difference between surface, descriptive difference versus deep, moral difference by reference to the well-worn example of the traditional Inuit practice of leaving elders to die from exposure. Although at the surface level of description, this practice seems radically different from contemporary Western attitudes toward the ethical treatment of the elderly (pervasive elder-abuse notwithstanding), the underlying moral justification for the practice—namely, that material resources are limited, the elders themselves choose this fate, the practice is a way for elders to die with dignity, and so forth—sounds remarkably similar in spirit to the familiar sorts of moral values contemporary Westerners invoke.

Cultural anthropology itself has generated controversy regarding the extent as well as the metaethical significance of moral differences at the deep level of fundamental justifications and values. Responding to both the assumption of cultural superiority as well as the Romantic attraction to viewing exotic cultures as Noble Savages, early twentieth-century anthropologists frequently adopted a methodology of relativism, on the grounds that accurate empirical information would be ignored if a cultural difference was examined with any a priori moral bias. An early exponent of this anthropological relativism was William Graham Sumner (1906) who, reflecting on what he referred to as different cultural folkways (that is, traditions or practices), claimed provocatively that, “the folkways are their own warrant.” Numerous anthropologists who were influenced by Franz Boas (1911) adopted a similar refusal to morally evaluate cross-cultural differences, culminating in an explicit embrace of metaethical relativism by anthropologists such as Ruth Benedict (1934) and Melville Herskovits (1952).

Several notable philosophers in the Continental tradition have also affirmed the sociological and anthropological relativism mentioned above. Specifically, the deconstructivism of Jacques Derrida, with its suspicion regarding “logocentric” biases, might be understood as a warning against metaethical objectivism. Instead, a deconstructivist might argue that ethical meaning (like all meaning) is characterized by what Derrida called différance, that is, an intractable un-decidability. (See Derrida (1996), however, for the possibility of a less relativistic deconstructivist ethics.) Other contemporary Continental approaches have similarly eschewed realism. For example, Mary Daly (1978) has defended a radical feminist critique of the sexual biases inherent in how we talk about values. For other perspectives on the possible tensions between feminism and the metaethics of cultural diversity, see Okin (1999) and Nussbaum (1999: 29-54). Michel Foucault (1984) is also well-known for his general criticism of the uses and abuses of power in the construction and expression of moral valuations pertaining to mental health, sexuality, and criminality. Similar critiques concerning the transplantation of a particular set of cultural values to other cultural contexts have been expressed by a number of post-colonialists and literary theorists, who have theorized about the imperialism, silencing (Spivak 1988), Orientalism (Said 1978), and cultural hybridity (Bhabha 1994) such moral universalism may involve.

b. Cross-Cultural Similarities

For all the apparent cross-cultural moral diversity, however, there have also been several suggestions against extending anthropological relativism to the metaethical level. First, a variety of empirical studies seem to suggest that the degree of moral similarity at the deep level of fundamental justifications and values may be greater than Boas and his students anticipated. Thus, for example, Jonathan Haidt (2004) has argued that cross-cultural differences show strong evidence of resolving around a finite number of basic moral values (what Haidt calls “modules”). From a somewhat more abstract perspective, Thomas Kasulis (2002) has also defended the view that cross-cultural differences can be sorted into two fundamental “orientations.” However, the congealing of cross-cultural differences around a small, finite number of basic values need not prove moral realism—for, those basic values may themselves still be ultimately relative to human needs and perspectives (compare, Wong 2006).

There are also several theoretical challenges to inferring metaethical relativism from anthropological differences. For one thing, as Michele Moody-Adams (1997) has argued, metaethical assessments about the degree or depth of moral differences are “empirically underdetermined” by the anthropological description of the practices themselves. For example, anthropological data about the moral content of a culturally different practice may be biased on behalf of the cultural informant who supplies the data or characterization. Similar critiques of cross-cultural moral relativism have leveraged what is known as The Principle of Charity—the hermeneutic insight that differences must at least be commensurable enough to even be framed as “different” from one another in the first place. Thus, goes the argument, if cross-cultural moral differences were so radically different as to be incomparable to one another, we could never truly morally disagree at all; we would instead be simply “talking past” one another (compare Davidson 2001). Much of our ability to translate between the moral practices of one culture and another—an ability central to the very enterprise of comparative philosophy—presupposes that even moral differences are still recognizably moral differences at root.

8. Political Implications of Metaethics

In addition to accommodating or accounting for the existence of moral disagreements, metaethics has also been thought to provide some insight concerning how we should respond to such differences at the normative or political level. Most often, debates concerning the morally appropriate response to moral differences have been framed against analyses concerning the relationship between metaethics and toleration. On the one hand, tolerating practices and values with which one might disagree has been a hallmark of liberal democratic societies. Should this permissive attitude, however, be extended indiscriminately to all values and practices with which one disagrees? Are some moral differences simply intolerable, such that it would undermine one’s own moral convictions to even attempt to tolerate them? More vexingly, is it conceptually possible or desirable to tolerate the intolerance of others (a paradox sometimes referred to as the Liberal’s Dilemma)? Karl Popper (1945) famously argued against the toleration of intolerance, which he saw as an overly-indulgent extension of the concept and one which would undermine the “open society” he believed to be a prerequisite for toleration in the first place. By contrast, John Rawls (1971) has argued that toleration—even of intolerance—is a constitutive part of justice (derivable from what Rawls calls the “liberty principle” of justice), such that failure to be tolerant would entail failure to satisfy one of the requirements of justice. Rawls emphasizes, however, that genuine toleration need not lead to utopia or agreement, and that it is substantially different from a mere modus vivendi, that is, simply putting up with one another because we are powerless to do otherwise. According to Rawls, true toleration requires that we seek to bring our differences into an “overlapping consensus,” which he claims will be possible due to an inherent incompleteness and “looseness in our comprehensive views” (2001: 193).

The value of toleration is often claimed as an exclusive asset of individual metaethical theories. For example, metaethical relativists frequently argue that only by acknowledging the ultimately subjective and conventional nature of morality can we make sense of why we should not morally judge others’ values or practices—after all, according to relativism, there would be no culture-transcendent standard against which to make such judgments. For this reason, Neil Levy claims that, “The perception that relativism promotes, or is the expression of, tolerance of difference is almost certainly the single most important factor in explaining its attraction” (2002: 56). Indeed, even metaethical realists (Shafer-Landau 2004: 30-31) often observe that undergraduate endorsements of relativism seem to be motivated by an anxiety about condemning foreign practices. Despite the apparent leeway with respect to moral differences that metaethical relativism would appear to allow, several realists have argued, by contrast, that relativism could equally be as compatible with intolerance. After all, goes the argument, if nothing is objectively or universally morally wrong, then a fortiori intolerant practices cannot be said to be universally or objectively wrong either. People or cultures who do not approve of an intolerant practice would only be reflecting their own culture’s commitment to toleration (compare Graham 1996). For this reason, several metaethicists have argued that realism alone can support the commitment to toleration as a universal value—such that intolerance can be morally condemned—because only realism allows for the existence of universal, objective moral values (compare, Shafer-Landau 2004: 30-33). Nicholas Rescher (1993) expresses a related worry about what he calls “indifferentism”—a nihilistic nonchalance regarding specific ethical commitments that might be occasioned by an embrace of metaethical relativism. Rescher’s own solution to the potential problem of indifferentism (he calls his view “contextualism” or “perspectival rationalism”) involves the recognition of the reasons-giving nature of circumstances, such that different situations may supply their own “local” justifications for particular political or moral commitments.

The question of which metaethical theory—realism or relativism—can lay better claim to toleration, however, has been complicated by reflection on what “toleration” truly involves and whether it is always, in fact, a moral value. Andrew Cohen (2004), for instance, has argued that “toleration” by definition must involve some negative evaluation of the practice or value that is tolerated. Thus, on this analysis, it would seem that one may only tolerate that which one finds intolerable. This has led philosophers such as Bernard Williams (1996) to question whether toleration—understood as requiring moral disapproval—is even possible, let alone whether it is truly a moral value itself. (For more discussion on toleration, see Heyd 1996.) In a related vein, Richard Rorty (1989) has argued that what a society finds intolerant is itself morally constitutive of that society’s identity, and that recognition of the metaethical contingency of one’s particular social tolerance might itself provide an important sense of political “solidarity.” For these reasons, other philosophers have considered alternative understandings of toleration that might be more amenable to particular metaethical theories. David B. Wong (2006: 228-272), for example, has developed an account of what he calls accommodation, according to which even relativists may still share a higher-order commitment to the need for different practices and values to be arranged in such a way as to minimize social and political friction.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Textual Citations

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Boas, Franz. (1911). The Mind of Primitive Man. Free Press.
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Boyd, Richard. (1988). “How to be a Moral Realist,” in Essays on Moral Realism, ed. Geoffrey Sayre-McCord. Cornell University Press 1988, ch. 9.
Boylan, Michael. (2004). A Just Society. Rowman & Littlefield Publishers.
Boylan, Michael, ed. (1999). Gewirth: Critical Essays on Action, Rationality, and Community. Rowman & Littlefield Publishers.
Brink, David. (1989). Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge University Press.
Calhoun, Cheshire and Solomon, Robert, eds. What Is An Emotion? Oxford University Press.
Chisholm, Roderick. (1981). The First Person: An Essay on Reference and Intentionality. University of Minnesota Press.
Cohen, Andrew. (2004). “What Toleration Is,” Ethics 115: 68-95.
Copp, David. (2007). Morality in a Natural World. Cambridge University Press.
Daly, Mary. (1978). Gyn/Ecology: The Metaethics of Radical Feminism. Beacon Press.
Dancy, Jonathan. (2006). Ethics without Principles. Oxford University Press.
Dancy, Jonathan. (2000). Practical Reality. Oxford University Press.
Darwall, Stephen. (2006). “How Should Ethics Relate to Philosophy?” in Metaethics after Moore, eds. Terry Horgan & Mark Timmons. Oxford University Press 2006, ch.1.
Darwall, Stephen. (1995). The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’. Cambridge University Press.
Davidson, Donald. (2001). Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation. Clarendon Press.
DeLapp, Kevin. (2009). “Les Mains Sales Versus Le Sale Monde: A Metaethical Look at Dirty Hands,” Essays in Philosophy 10 (1).
DeLapp, Kevin. (2009). “The Merits of Dispositional Moral Realism,” Journal of Value Inquiry 43 (1): 1-18.
DeLapp, Kevin. (2007). “Moral Perception and Moral Realism: An ‘Intuitive’ Account of Epistemic Justification,” Review Journal of Political Philosophy 5: 43-64.
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Doris, John. (2002). Lack of Character. Cambridge University Press.
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Foot, Philippa. (2001). Natural Goodness. Clarendon Press.
Foot, Philippa. (1972). “Morality as a System of Hypothetical Imperatives,” Philosophical Review 81 (3): 305-316.
Foucault, Michel. (1984). The Foucault Reader, ed. Paul Rabinow. Pantheon Books.
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Gilligan, Carol. (1982). In a Different Voice. Harvard University Press.
Gordon, John-Stewart, ed. (2009). Morality and Justice: Reading Boylan’s A Just Society. Lexington Books.
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Graham, Gordon. (1996). “Tolerance, Pluralism, and Relativism,” in David Heyd, ed. Toleration: An Elusive Virtue. Princeton University Press, 1996: 44-59.
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Haidt, Jonathan and Graham, Jesse. (2007). “When Morality Opposes Justice: Conservatives Have Moral Intuitions and Liberals May Not Recognize,” Social Justice Research 20 (1): 98-116.
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Hare, R.M. (1982). Moral Thinking. Oxford University Press.
Harman, Gilbert. (2009). “Guilt-Free Morality,” Oxford Studies in Metaethics 4: 203-214.
Harman, Gilbert. (1977). The Nature of Morality. Oxford University Press.
Harman, Gilbert. (1985). “Is There A Single True Morality?” in David Copp and David Zimmerman, eds. Morality, Reason and Truth. Rowman & Littlefield, 1985: 27-48.
Harman, Gilbert. (1975). “Moral Relativism Defended,” Philosophical Review 85 (1): 3-22.
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Herskovits, Melville. (1952). Man and His Works. A.A. Knopf.
Heyd, David, ed. (1996). Toleration: An Elusive Virtue. Princeton University Press.
Hooker, Brad and Little, Margaret, eds. (2000). Moral Particularism. Oxford University Press.
Horgan, Terence and Timmons, Mark. (1991). “New Wave Moral Realism Meets Moral Twin Earth,” Journal of Philosophical Research 16: 447-465.
Hudson, W.D. (1967). Ethical Intuitionism. St. Martin’s Press.
Hume, David. (1740). A Treatise on Human Nature. L.A. Selby-Bigge, ed. Oxford University Press, 2e (1978).
Hurka, Thomas. (2003) “Moore in the Middle,” Ethics 113 (3): 599-628.
Jackson, Frank and Pettit, Philip. (1995). “Moral Functionalism and Moral Motivation,” Philosophical Quarterly 45: 20-40.
James, William. (1896). “The Will to Believe,” in The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy. Dover Publishers, 1956.
Joyce, Richard. (2001). The Myth of Morality. Cambridge University Press.
Kalderon, Mark, ed. (2005). Moral Fictionalism. Clarendon Press.
Kasulis, Thomas. (2002). Intimacy or Integrity: Philosophy and Cultural Difference. University of Hawai’i Press.
Kjellberg, Paul and Ivanhoe, Philip, eds. (1996). Essays on Skepticism, Relativism, and Ethics in the Zhuangzi. SUNY Press.
Knobe, Joshua and Nichols, Shuan, eds. (2008). Experimental Philosophy. Oxford University Press.
Korsgaard, Christine. (1996). The Sources of Normativity. Cambridge University Press.
Kramer, Matthew. (2009). Moral Realism as a Moral Doctrine. Wiley-Blackwell Publishers.
Levy, Neil. (2002). Moral Relativism: A Short Introduction. Oneworld Publications.
Lovibond, Sabina. (1983). Realism and Imagination in Ethics. Minnesota University Press.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. (1988). Whose Justice? Which Rationality? Notre Dame Press.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. (1984). After Virtue, 2e. Notre Dame Press.
Mackie, J.L. (1977). Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. Penguin Books.
Markus, H.R. and Kitayama, S. (1991). “Culture and the Self: Implications for Cognition, Culture, and Motivation,” Psychological Review 98: 224-253.
McCrae, R.R. and John, O.P. (1992). “An Introduction to the Five-Factor Model and Its Applications,” Journal of Personality 60: 175-215.
McDowell, John. (1985) “Values and Secondary Qualities,” in Morality and Objectivity, ed. Ted Honderich. Routledge (1985): 110-29.
McDowell, John. (1978). “Are Moral Requirements Hypothetical Imperatives?” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, supp. Vol. 52: 13-29.
McNaughton, David. (1988). Moral Vision. Blackwell Publishing.
Miller, J.G. and Bersoff, D.M. (1992). “Culture and Moral Judgment: How Are Conflicts between Justice and Interpersonal Relationships Resolved?” Journal of Personality and Social Psychology 62: 541-554.
Moody-Adams, Michele. (1997). Fieldwork in Familiar Places. Harvard University Press.
Moore, G.E. (1903). Principia Ethica. Cambridge University Press.
Murdoch, Iris. (1970). The Sovereignty of the Good. Routledge and Kegan Paul Press.
Neu, Jerome. (2000). A Tear is an Intellectual Thing. Oxford University Press.
Nichols, Shaun. (2004). “After Objectivity: An Empirical Study of Moral Judgment,” Philosophical Psychology 17: 5-28.
Nielsen, Kai. (1997). Why Be Moral? Prometheus Books.
Nussbaum, Martha. (1999). Sex and Social Justice. Oxford University Press.
Nussbaum, Martha. (1986). The Fragility of Goodness: Luck and Ethics in Greek Tragedy and Philosophy. Cambridge University Press.
Okin, Susan Moller. (1999). Is Multiculturalism Bad for Women? Princeton University Press.
Plato. Republic, trans. G.M.A. Grube, in The Complete Works of Plato, ed. John Cooper. Hackett 1997.
Plato. Gorgias, trans. Donald Zeyl, in The Complete Works of Plato, ed. John Cooper. Hackett 1997.
Platts, Mark. (1991). Moral Realities: An Essay in Philosophical Psychology. Routledge Press.
Putnam, Hilary. (1981). Reason, Truth, and History. Cambridge University Press.
Rachels, James. (1986). “The Challenge of Cultural Relativism,” in Rachels, The Elements of Moral Philosophy. Random House (1999): 20-36.
Railton, Peter. (1986). “Moral Realism,” Philosophical Review 95: 163-207.
Ramsey, Frank. (1927). “Facts and Propositions,” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Vol. 7: 153-170.
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Regan, Tom. (1986). Bloomsbury’s Prophet. Temple University Press.
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Rorty, Richard. (1989). Contingency, Irony, and Solidarity. Cambridge University Press.
Ross, W.D. (1930). The Right and the Good. Oxford University Press.
Rottshaefer, William. (1999). “Moral Learning and Moral Realism: How Empirical Psychology Illuminates Issues in Moral Ontology,” Behavior and Philosophy 27: 19-49.
Ryle, Gilbert. (1968). “What is Le Penseur Doing?” in Collected Papers 2 (1971): 480-496.
Said, Edward. (1978). Orientalism. Vintage Books.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey. (1985). “Coherence and Models for Moral Theorizing,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 66:
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Schroeder, Mark. (2008). “What is the Frege-Geach Problem?” Philosophy Compass 3 (4): 703-720.
Schueler, G.F. (1988). “Modus Ponens and Moral Realism,” Ethics 98: 492-500.
Selby-Bigge, L.A., ed. (1897). The British Moralists of the Eighteenth-century. Clarendon Press.
Shafer-Landau, Russ. (2004). Whatever Happened to Good and Evil? Oxford University Press.
Shafer-Landau, Russ. (2003). Moral Realism: A Defense. Oxford University Press.
Smith, Michael. (1994). The Moral Problem. Blackwell Publishers.
Smith, Michael. (1994). “Why Expressivists about Value Should Love Minimalism about Truth,” Analysis 54 (1): 1-11.
Spence, Edward. (2006). Ethics within Reason: A Neo-Gewirthian Approach. Lexington Books.
Steigleder, Klaus. (1999). Grundlegung der normativen Ethik: Der Ansatz von Alan Gewirth. Alber Publishers.
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Stevenson, C.L. (1944). Ethics and Language. Yale University Press.
Stocker, Michael. (1990). Plural and Conflicting Values. Oxford University Press.
Spivak, Gayatri Chakravorty. (1988). “Can the Subaltern Speak?” in Marxism and the Interpretation of Culture, eds. C. Nelson and L. Grossberg. Macmillan Books, 1988: 271-313.
Stratton-Lake, Philip, ed. (2002). Ethical Intuitionism: Re-Evaluations. Oxford University Press.
Sturgeon, Nicholas. (1988). “Moral Explanations,” in Essays on Moral Realism, ed. GeoffreySayre-McCord. Cornell University Press 1988, ch. 10.
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Tännsjö, Torbjörn. (1990). Moral Realism. Rowman & Littlefield Publishers.
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Williams, Bernard. (1985). Ethics and the Limits of Philosophy. Harvard University Press.
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b. Anthologies and Introductions

Fisher, Andrew and Kirchin, Simon, eds. (2006). Arguing about Metaethics. Routledge Press.
Harman, Gilbert and Thomson, J.J. (1996). Moral Relativism and Moral Objectivity. Blackwell Publishers.
Miller, Alexander. (2003). An Introduction to Contemporary Metaethics. Polity Press.
Moser, Paul and Carson, Thomas, eds. (2001). Moral Relativism: A Reader. Oxford University Press.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey, ed. (1988). Essays on Moral Realism. Cornell University Press.
Shafer-Landau, Russ, ed. (2001-2010). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 1-5. Oxford University Press.

Author Information

Kevin M. DeLapp
Email: kevin.delapp@converse.edu
Converse College
U. S. A.

Theory of Mind

Theory of Mind is the branch of cognitive science that investigates how we ascribe mental states to other persons and how we use the states to explain and predict the actions of those other persons. More accurately, it is the branch that investigates mindreading or mentalizing or mentalistic abilities. These skills are shared by almost all human beings beyond early childhood. They are used to treat other agents as the bearers of unobservable psychological states and processes, and to anticipate and explain the agents’ behavior in terms of such states and processes. These mentalistic abilities are also called “folk psychology” by philosophers, and “naïve psychology” and “intuitive psychology” by cognitive scientists.

It is important to note that Theory of Mind is not an appropriate term to characterize this research area (and neither to denote our mentalistic abilities) since it seems to assume right from the start the validity of a specific account of the nature and development of mindreading, that is, the view that it depends on the deployment of a theory of the mental realm, analogous to the theories of the physical world (“naïve physics”). But this view—known as theory-theory—is only one of the accounts offered to explain our mentalistic abilities. In contrast, theorists of mental simulation have suggested that what lies at the root of mindreading is not any sort of folk-psychological conceptual scheme, but rather a kind of mental modeling in which the simulator uses her own mind as an analog model of the mind of the simulated agent.

Both theory-theory and simulation-theory are actually families of theories. Some theory-theorists maintain that our naïve theory of mind is the product of the scientific-like exercise of a domain-general theorizing capacity. Other theory-theorists defend a quite different hypothesis, according to which mindreading rests on the maturation of a mental organ dedicated to the domain of psychology. Simulation-theory also shows different facets. According to the “moderate” version of simulationism, mental concepts are not completely excluded from simulation. Simulation can be seen as a process through which we first generate and self-attribute pretend mental states that are intended to correspond to those of the simulated agent, and then project them onto the target. By contrast, the “radical” version of simulationism rejects the primacy of first-person mindreading and contends that we imaginatively transform ourselves into the simulated agent, interpreting the target’s behavior without using any kind of mental concept, not even ones referring to ourselves.

Finally, the claim─common to both theorists of theory and theorists of simulation─that mindreading plays a primary role in human social understanding was challenged in the early 21^st century, mainly by phenomenology-oriented philosophers and cognitive scientists.

Theory-Theory
Simulation-Theory
1. Simulation with and without Introspection
2. Simulation in Low-Level Mindreading
Social Cognition without Mindreading
References and Further Reading
1. Suggested Further Reading
2. References

1. Theory-Theory

Social psychologists have investigated mindreading since at least the 1940s. In Heider and Simmel’s (1944) classic studies, participants were presented with animated events involving interacting geometric shapes. When asked to report what they saw, the participants almost invariably treated these shapes as intentional agents with motives and purposes, suggesting the existence of an automatic capacity for mentalistic attribution. Pursuing this line of research would lead to Heider’s The Psychology of Interpersonal Relations (1958), a seminal book which is one of the main historical referents of the scientific inquiry into our mentalistic practice. In this book Heider characterizes “commonsense psychology” as a sophisticated conceptual scheme that has an influence on human perception and action in the social world comparable to that which Kant’s categorical framework has on human perception and action in the physical world (see Malle & Ickes 2000: 201).

Heider’s visionary work played a central role in the origination and definition of attribution theory, that is, the field of social psychology that investigates the mechanisms underlying ordinary explanations of our own and other people’s behavior. However, attribution theory is a quite different way of approaching our mentalistic practice. Heider took commonsense psychology in its real value of knowledge, arguing that scientific psychology has a good deal to learn from it. In contrast, most research on causal attribution has been faithful to behaviorism’s methodological lesson and focused on the epistemic inaccuracy of commonsense psychology.

Two years before Heider’s book, Wilfred Sellars’ (1956) Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind had suggested that our grasp of mental phenomena does not originate from direct access to our inner life, but is the result of a “folk” theory of mind, which we acquire through some form or other of enculturation. Sellars’ speculation turned out to be very philosophically productive and in agreement with social-psychology research on self-attribution, coming to be known as “Theory-Theory” (a term coined by Morton 1980—henceforth “TT”).

During the 1970s one or other form of TT was seen as a very effective antidote to Cartesianism and philosophical behaviorism. In particular, TT was coupled with Nagel’s (1961) classic account of intertheoretic reduction as deduction of the reduced from the reducing theory via bridge principles in order to turn the ontological problem of the relationship between the mental and the physical into a more tractable epistemological problem concerning the relations between theories. Thus it became possible to take a notion—intertheoretic reduction—rigorously studied by philosophers of science; to examine the relations between folk psychology as a theory including the commonsense mentalistic ontology and its scientific successors (scientific psychology, neuroscience, or some other form of science of the mental); and to let ontological/metaphysical questions be answered by (i) focusing on questions about explanation and theory reduction first and foremost, and then (ii) depending on how those first questions were answered, drawing the appropriate ontological/metaphysical conclusions based on a comparison with how similar questions about explanation and reduction got answered in other scientific episodes and the ontological conclusions philosophers and scientists drew in those cases (this strategy is labelled “the intertheoretic-reduction reformulation of the mind-body problem” in Bickle 2003).

In this context, TT was taken as the major premise in the standard argument for eliminative materialism (see Ramsey 2011: §2.1). In its strongest form, eliminativism predicts that part or all of our folk-psychological theory will vanish into thin air, just as it happened in the past when scientific progress led to the abandonment of the folk theory of witchcraft or the protoscientific theories of phlogiston and caloric fluid. This prediction rests on an argument which moves from considering folk psychology as a massively defective theory to the conclusion that—just as with witches, phlogiston, and caloric fluid—folk-psychological entities do not exist. Thus philosophy of mind joined attribution theory in adopting a critical attitude toward the explanatory adequacy of folk psychology (see, for example, Stich’s 1983 eliminativistic doubts about the folk concept of belief, motivated inter alia by the experimental social psychology literature on dissonance and self-attribution).

Notice, however, that TT can be differently construed depending on whether we adopt a personal or subpersonal perspective (see Stich & Ravenscroft 1994: §4). The debate between intentional realists and eliminativists favored David Lewis’ personal-level formulation of TT. According to Lewis, the folk theory of mind is implicit in our everyday talk about mental states. We entertain “platitudes” regarding the causal relations of mental states, sensory stimuli, and motor responses that can be systematized (or “Ramsified”). The result is a functionalist theory that gives the terms of mentalistic vocabulary their meaning in the same way as scientific theories define their theoretical terms, namely “as the occupants of the causal roles specified by the theory…; as the entities, whatever those may be, that bear certain causal relations to one another and to the referents of the O[bservational]-terms” (Lewis 1972: 211). In this perspective, mindreading can be described as an exercise in reflective reasoning, which involves the application of general reasoning abilities to premises including ceteris paribus folk-psychological generalizations. A good example of this conception of mindreading is Grice’s schema for the derivation of conversational implicatures:

He said that P; he could not have done this unless he thought that Q; he knows (and knows that I know that he knows) that I will realize that it is necessary to suppose that Q; he has done nothing to stop me thinking that Q; so he intends me to think, or is at least willing for me to think, that Q(Grice 1989: 30-1; cit. in Wilson 2005: 1133).

Since the end of the 1970s, however, primatology, developmental psychology, cognitive neuropsychiatry and empirically-informed philosophy have been contributing to a collaborative inquiry into TT. In the context of this literature the term “theory” refers to a “tacit” or “sub-doxastic” structure of knowledge, a corpus of internally represented information that guides the execution of mentalistic capacities. But then the functionalist theory that fixes the meaning of mentalistic terms is not the theory implicit in our everyday, mentalistic talk, but the tacit theory (in Chomsky’s sense) subserving our thought and talk about the mental realm (see Stich & Nichols 2003: 241). On this perspective, the inferential processes that depend on the theory have an automatic and unconscious character that distinguishes them from reflective reasoning processes.

In developmental psychology part of the basis for the study of mindreading skills in children was already in Jean Piaget’s seminal work on egocentrism in the 1930s to 50s, and the work on metacognition (especially metamemory) in the 1970s. But the developmental research on mindreading took off only under the thrust of three discoveries in the 1980s (see Leslie 1998). First, normally developing 2-year-olds are able to engage in pretend play. Second, normally developing children undergo a deep change in their understanding of the psychological states of other people somewhere between the ages of 3 and 4, as indicated especially by the appearance of their ability to solve a variety of “false-belief” problems (see immediately below). Lastly, children diagnosed with autism spectrum disorders are especially impaired in attributing mental states to other people.

In particular, Wimmer & Perner (1983) provided the theory-of-mind research with a seminal experimental paradigm: the “false-belief task.” In the most well-known version of this task, a child watches two puppets interacting in a room. One puppet (“Sally”) puts a toy in location A and then leaves the room. While Sally is out of the room, the other puppet (“Anne”) moves the toy from location A to location B. Sally returns to the room, and the child onlooker is asked where she will look for her toy, in location A or in location B. Now, 4- and 5-year-olds have little difficulty passing this test, judging that Sally will look for her toy in location A although it really is in location B. These correct answers provide evidence that the child realizes that Sally does not know that the toy has been moved, and so will act upon a false belief. Many younger children, typically 3-year-olds, fail such a task, often asserting that Sally will look for the toy in the place where it was moved. Dozens of versions of this task have now been used, and while the precise age of success varies between children and between task versions, in general we can confidently say that children begin to successfully perform the (“verbal”) false-belief tasks at around 4 years (see the meta-analysis in Wellman et al. 2001; see also below, the reference to “non-verbal” false-belief tasks).

Wimmer and Perner’s false-belief task set off a flood of experiments concerning the infant understanding of the mind. In this context, the first hypotheses about the process of acquisition of the naïve theory of mind were suggested. The finding that mentalistic skills emerge very early, in the first 3-4 years, and in a way relatively independent from the development of other cognitive abilities, led some scholars (for example, Simon Baron-Cohen, Jerry Fodor, Alan Leslie) to conceive them as the end-state of the endogenous maturation of an innate theory-of-mind module (or system of modules). This contrasted with the view of other researchers (for example, Alison Gopnik, Josef Perner, Henry Wellman), who maintained that the intuitive theory of mind develops in childhood in a manner comparable to the development of scientific theories.

a. The Child-Scientist Theory

According to a first version of TT, “the child (as little) scientist theory,” the body of internally-represented knowledge that drives the exercise of mentalistic abilities has much the same structure as a scientific theory, and it is acquired, stored, and used in much the same way that scientific theories are: by formulating explanations, making predictions, and then revising the theory or modifying auxiliary hypotheses when the predictions fail. Gopnik & Meltzoff (1997) put forward this idea in its more radical form. They argue that the body of knowledge underlying mindreading has all the structural, functional and dynamic features that, on their view, characterize most scientific theories. One of the most important features is defeasibility. As it happens in scientific practice, the child’s naïve theory of mind can also be “annulled,” that is, replaced when an accumulation of counterevidence to it occurs. The child-scientist theory is, therefore, akin to Piaget’s constructivism insofar as it depicts the cognitive development in childhood and early adolescence as a succession of increasingly sophisticated naïve theories. For instance, Wellman (1990) has argued that around age 4 children become able to pass the false-belief tests because they move from an elementary “copy” theory of mind to a fully “representational” theory of mind, which allows them to acknowledge the explanatory role of false beliefs.

The child-scientist theory inherits from Piaget not only the constructivist framework but also the idea that the cognitive development is a process that depends on a domain-general learning mechanism. A domain-general (or general-purpose) psychological structure is one that can be used to do problem solving across many different content domains; it contrasts with a domain-specific psychological structure, which is dedicated to solving a restricted class of problems in a restricted content domain (see Samuels 2000). Now, Piaget’s model of cognitive development posits an innate endowment of reflexes and domain-general learning mechanisms, which enable the child to set up sensorimotor interactions with the environment that unfold a steady improvement in the capacity of problem-solving in any cognitive domain—physical, biological, psychological, and so forth. Analogously, Gopnik & Schulz (2004, 2007) have argued that the learning mechanism that supports all of cognitive development is a domain-general Bayesian mechanism that allows children to extract causal structure from patterns of data.

Another theory-theorist who endorses a domain-general conception of cognitive development is Josef Perner (1991). On his view, it is the appearance of the ability to metarepresent that enables the 4-year-olds to shift from a “situation theory” to a “representation theory,” and thus pass false-belief tests. Children are situation theorists by the age of around 2 years. At 3 they possess a concept, “prelief” (or “betence”), in which the concepts of pretend and belief coexist undifferentiated. The concept of prelief allows the child to understand that a person can “act as if” something was such and such (for example, as if “this banana is a telephone”) when it is not. At 4 children acquire a representational concept of belief which enables them to understand that, like the public representations, inner representations can also misrepresent states of affairs (see Perner, Baker & Hutton 1994). Thus Perner suggests that children first learn to understand the properties of public (pictorial and linguistic) representations; only in a second moment they extend, through a process of analogical reasoning, these characteristics to mental representations. On this perspective, then, the concept of belief is the product of a domain-general metarepresentational capacity that includes but is not limited to metarepresentation of mental states. (But for criticism, see Harris 2000, who argues that pretence and belief are very different and are readily distinguished by context by 3-year olds.)

b. The Modularist Theory-Theory

According to the child-scientist theory, children learn the naïve theory of mind in much the same way that adults learn about scientific theories. By contrast, the modularist version of TT holds that the body of knowledge underlying mindreading lacks the structure of a scientific theory, being stored in one or more innate modules, which gradually become functional (“mature”) during infant development. Inside the module the body of information can be stored as a suite of domain-specific computational mechanisms; or as a system of domain-specific representations; or in both ways (see Simpson et al. 2005: 13).

The notion of modularity as domain-specificity, whose paradigm is Noam Chomsky’s module of language, informs the so-called “core knowledge” hypothesis, according to which human cognition builds on a repertoire of domain-specific systems of knowledge. Studies of children and adults in diverse cultures, human infants, and non-human primates provide evidence for at least four systems of knowledge that serve to represent significant aspects of the environment: inanimate objects and their motions; agents and their goal-directed actions; places and their geometric relations; sets and their approximate numerical relation. These are systems of domain-specific, task-specific representations, which are shared by other animals, persist in adults, and show little variation by culture, language or sex (see Carey & Spelke 1996; Spelke & Kinzler 2007).

And yet a domain-specific body of knowledge is an “inert” psychological structure, which gives rise to behavior only if it is manipulated by some cognitive mechanism. The question arises, then, whether the domain-specific body of information that subserves mentalistic abilities is the database of either a domain-specific or domain-general computational system. In some domains, a domain-specific computational mechanism and a domain-specific body of information can form a single mechanism (for example, a parser is very likely to be a domain-specific computational mechanism that manipulates a domain-specific data structure). But in other domains, as Samuels (1998, 2000) has noticed, domain-specific systems of knowledge might be computed by domain-general rather than domain-specific algorithms (but for criticism, see Carruthers 2006, §4.3).

The existence of a domain-specific algorithm that exploits a body of information specific to the domain of naïve psychology has been proposed by Alan Leslie (1994, 2000). He postulated a specialized component of social intelligence, the “Theory-of-Mind Mechanism” (ToMM), which receives as input information about the past and present behavior of other people and utilizes this information to compute their probable psychological states. The outputs of ToMM are descriptions of psychological states in the form of metarepresentations or M-representations, that is, agent-centered descriptions of behavior, which include a triadic relation that specifies four kinds of information: (i) an agent, (ii) an informational relation that specifies the agent’s attitude (pretending, believing, desiring, and so forth), (iii) an aspect of reality that grounds the agent’s attitude, (iv) the content of the agent’s attitude. Therefore, in order to pretend and understand others’ pretending, the child’s ToMM is supposed to output the M-representation <Mother PRETENDS (of) this banana (that) “it is a telephone”>. Analogously, in order to predict Sally’s behavior in the false-belief test, ToMM is supposed to output the M-representation <Sally BELIEVES (of) her marble (that) “it is in the basket”>. (Note that Leslie coined the term “M-representation” to distinguish his own concept of meta-representation from Perner’s 1991. For Perner uses the term at a personal level to refer to the child’s conscious theory of representation, whereas Leslie utilizes the term at a subpersonal level to designate an unconscious data structure computed by an information-processing mechanism. See Leslie & Thaiss 1992: 231, note 2.)

In the 1980s, Leslie’s ToMM hypothesis was the basis for the development of a neuropsychological perspective on autism. Children suffering from this neurodevelopmental disorder exhibit a triad of impairments: social incompetence, poor verbal and nonverbal communicative skills, and a lack of pretend play. Because social competence, communication, and pretending all rest on mentalistic abilities, Baron-Cohen, Frith & Leslie (1985) speculated that the autistic triad might be the result of an impaired ToMM. This hypothesis was investigated in an experiment in which typically developing 4-year-olds, children with autism (12 years; IQ 82), and children with Down syndrome (10 years; IQ 64) were tested on the Sally and Ann false-belief task. Eighty-five percent of the normally developing children and 86% of the children with Down syndrome passed the test; but only 20% of the autistic children predicted that Sally would look in the basket. This is one of the first examples of psychiatry driven by cognitive neuropsychology (followed by Christopher Frith’s 1992 theory of schizophrenia as late-onset autism).

According to Leslie, the ToMM is the specific innate basis of basic mentalistic abilities, which matures during the infant’s second year. In support of this hypothesis, he cites inter alia his analysis of pretend play that would show that 18-month-old children are able to metarepresent the propositional attitude of pretending. This analysis results, however, in an immediate empirical problem. If the ToMM is fully functional at 18 months, why are children unable to successfully perform false-belief tasks until they are around 4 years old? Leslie’s hypothesis is that although the concept of belief is already in place in children younger than 4, in the false-belief tasks this concept is masked by immaturity in another capacity that is necessary for good performance on the task—namely inhibitory control. Since, by default, the ToMM attributes a belief with content that reflects current reality, to succeed in a false-belief task this default attribution must be inhibited and an alternative nonfactual content for the belief selected instead. This is the task of an executive control mechanism that Leslie calls “Selection Processor” (SP). Thus 3-year-olds fail standard false-belief tasks because they possess the ToMM but not yet the inhibitory SP (see Leslie & Thaiss 1992; Leslie & Polizzi 1998).

The ToMM/SP model seems to find support in a series of experiments that test understanding of false mental and public representations in normal and autistic children. Leslie & Thaiss (1992) have found that normal 3-year-olds fail the standard false-belief tasks, the two non-mental meta-representational tests, the false-map task and Zaitchik’s (1990) outdated-photograph task. In contrast, autistic children are at or near ceiling on the non-mental metarepresentational tests but fail false-belief tasks. Normal 4-year-olds can succeed in all these tasks. According to Leslie and Thaiss, the ToMM/SP model can account for these findings: normal 3-year-olds possess the ToMM but not yet SP; autistic children are impaired in ToMM but not in SP; normal 4-year-olds possess both the ToMM and an adequate SP. By contrast, these results appear to be counterevidence to Perner’s idea that children first understand public representations before then applying that understanding to mental states. If this were right, then autistic children should have difficulty with both kinds of representations. And in fact Perner (1993) suggests that the autistic deficit is due to a genetic impairment of the mechanisms that subserve attention shifting, a damage that interferes with the formation of the database required for the development of a theory of representation in general. But what autistics’ performance in mental and non-mental metarepresentational tasks seems to show is a dissociation between understanding false maps and outdated photographs, on one hand, and understanding false beliefs, on the other. A finding that can be easily explained in the context of Leslie’s domain-specific approach to mindreading, according to which children with autism have a specific deficit in understanding mental representation but not representation in general. In support of this interpretation, fMRI studies showed that activity in the right temporo-parietal junction is high while participants are thinking about false beliefs, but no different from resting levels while participants are thinking about outdated photographs or false maps or signs. This suggests a neural substrate for the behavioral dissociation between pictorial and mental metarepresentational abilities (see Saxe & Kanwisher 2003; for a critical discussion of the domain-specificity interpretation of these behavioral and neuroimaging data, see Gerrans & Stone 2008; Perner & Aichhorn 2008; Perner & Leekam 2008).

Leslie (2005) recruits new data to support his claim that mental metarepresentational abilities emerge from a specialized neurocognitive mechanism that matures during the second year of life. Standard false-belief tasks are “elicited-response” tasks in which children are asked a direct question about an agent’s false belief. But investigations using “spontaneous-response” tasks (Onishi & Baillargeon 2005) seem to suggest that the ability to attribute false beliefs is present much earlier, at the age of 15 months (even at 13 months in Surian, Caldi & Sperber 2007). However, Leslie’s mentalistic interpretation of these data has been challenged by Ruffman & Perner (2005), who have proposed an explanation of Onishi and Baillargeon’s results that assumes that the infants might be employing a non-mentalistic behavior-rule such as, “People look for objects where last seen” (for replies, see Baillargeon et al. 2010).

The ToMM has been considered, contra Fodor, as one of the strongest candidates for central modularity (see, for example, Botterill & Carruthers 1999: 67-8). However, Samuels (2006: 47) has objected that it is difficult to establish whether or not the ToMM’s domain of application is really central cognition. He suggests that the question is still more controversial in light of Leslie’s proposal of modelling ToMM as a relatively low-level mechanism of selective attention, whose functioning depends on SP, which is a non-modular mechanism, penetrable to knowledge and instruction (see Leslie, Friedman & German 2004).

c. First-Person Mindreading and Theory-Theory

During the 1980s and 1990s most of the work in Theory of Mind was concerned with the mechanisms that subserve the attribution of psychological states to others (third-person mindreading). In the last decade, however, an increasing number of psychologists and philosophers have also proposed accounts of the mechanisms underlying the attribution of psychological states to oneself (first-person mindreading).

For most theory-theorists, first-person mindreading is an interpretative activity that depends on mechanisms that capitalize on the same theory of mind used to attribute mental states to other agents. Such mechanisms are triggered by information about mind-external states of affairs, essentially the target’s behavior and/or the situation in which it occurs/occurred. The claim is, then, that there is a functional symmetry between first-person and third-person mentalistic attribution—the “outside access” view of introspection in Robbins (2006: 619); the “symmetrical” or “self/other parity” account of self-knowledge in Schwitzgebel (2010, §2.1).

The first example of a symmetrical account of self-knowledge is Bem’s (1972) “self-perception theory.” With reference to Skinner’s methodological guidance, but with a position that reveals affinities with symbolic interactionism, Bem holds that one knows one’s own inner states (for example, attitudes and emotions) through a process completely analogous to that occurring when one knows other people’ inner states, that is, by inferring them from the observation/recollection of one’s own behavior and/or the circumstances in which it occurs/occurred. The TT version of the symmetrical account of self-knowledge develops Bem’s approach by claiming that observations and recollections of one’s own behavior and the circumstances in which it occurs/occurred are the input of mechanisms that exploit theories that apply to the same extent to ourselves and to others.

In the well-known social-psychology experiments reviewed by Nisbett & Wilson (1977), the participants’ attitudes and behavior were caused by motivational factors inaccessible to consciousness—such factors as cognitive dissonance, numbers of bystanders in a public crisis, positional and “halo” effects and subliminal cues in problem solving and semantic disambiguation, and so on. However, when explicitly asked about the motivations (causes) of their actions, the subjects did not hesitate to state, sometimes with great eloquence, their very reasonable motives. Nisbett and Wilson explained this pattern of results by arguing that the subjects did not have any direct access to the real causes of their attitudes and behavior; rather, they engaged in an activity of confabulation, that is, they exploited a priori causal theories to develop reasonable but imaginary explanations of the motivational factors of their attitudes and behavior (see also Johansson et al. 2006, where Nisbett and Wilson’s legacy is developed through a new experimental paradigm to study introspection, the “choice blindness” paradigm).

Evidence for the symmetrical account of self-knowledge comes from Nisbett & Bellows’ (1977) utilization of the so-called “actor-observer paradigm.” In one experiment they compared the introspective reports of participants (“actors”) to the reports of a control group of “observers” who were given a general description of the situation and asked to predict how the actors would react. Observers’ predictions were found to be statistically identical to—and as inaccurate as—the reports by the actors. This finding suggests that “both groups produced these reports via the same route, namely by applying or generating similar causal theories” (Nisbett & Wilson 1977: 250-1; see also Schwitzgebel 2010: §§2.1.2 and 4.2.1).

In developmental psychology Alison Gopnik (1993) has defended a symmetrical account of self-knowledge by arguing that there is good developmental evidence of developmental synchronies: children’s understanding of themselves proceeds in lockstep with their understanding of others. For example, since TT assumes that first-person and third-person mentalistic attributions are both subserved by the same theory of mind, it predicts that if the theory is not yet equipped to solve certain third-person false-belief problems, then the child should also be unable to perform the parallel first-person task. A much discussed instance of parallel performance on tasks for self and other is in Gopnik & Astington (1988). In the “Smarties Box” experiment, children were shown with the candy container for the British confection “Smarties” and were asked what they thought was in the container. Naturally they answered “Smarties.” The container was then opened to reveal not Smarties, but a pencil. Children were then asked a series of questions, including “What will [your friend] say is in the box?”, and successively “When you first saw the box, before we opened it, what did you think was inside it?”. It turned out that the children’s ability to answer the question concerning oneself was significantly correlated with their ability to answer the question concerning another. (See also the above-cited Wellman et al. 2001, which offers meta-analytic findings to the effect that performance on false-belief tasks for self and for others is virtually identical at all ages.)

Data from autism have also been used to motivate the claim that first-person and third-person mentalistic attribution has a common basis. An intensely debated piece of evidence comes from a study by Hurlburt, Happé & Frith (1994), in which three people suffering from Asperger syndrome were tested with the descriptive experience sampling method. In this experimental paradigm, subjects are instructed to carry a random beeper, pay attention to the experience that was ongoing at the moment of the beep, and jot down notes about that now-immediately-past experience (see Hurlburt & Schwitzgebel 2007). The study showed marked qualitative differences in introspection in the autistic subjects: unlike normal subjects who report several different phenomenal state types—including inner verbalisation, visual images, unsymbolised thinking, and emotional feelings—the first two autistic subjects reported visual images only; the third subject could report no inner experience at all. According to Frith & Happé (1999: 14), this evidence strengthens the hypothesis that self-awareness, like other-awareness, is dependent on the same theory of mind.

Thus, evidence from social psychology, development psychology and cognitive neuropsychiatry makes a case for a symmetrical account of self-knowledge. As Schwitzgebel (2010: §2.1.3) rightly notes, however, no one advocates a thoroughly symmetrical conception because some margin is always left for some sort of direct self-knowledge. Nisbett & Wilson (1977: 255), for example, draw a sharp distinction between “cognitive processes” (the causal processes underlying judgments, decisions, emotions, sensations) and mental “content” (those judgments, decisions, emotions, sensations themselves). Subjects have “direct access” to this mental content, and this allows them to know it “with near certainty.” In contrast, they have no access to the processes that cause behavior. However, insofar as Nisbett and Wilson do not propose any hypothesis about this alleged direct self-knowledge, their theory is incomplete.

In order to offer an account of this supposedly direct self-knowledge, some philosophers made a more or less radical return to various forms of Cartesianism, construing first-person mindreading as a process that permits the access to at least some mental phenomena in a relatively direct and non-interpretative way. On this perspective, introspective access does not appeal to theories that serve to interpret “external” information, but rather exploits mechanisms that can receive information about inner life through a relatively direct channel— the “inside access” view of introspection in Robbins (2006: 618); the “self-detection” account of self-knowledge in Schwitzgebel (2010: §2.2).

The inside access view comes in various forms. Mentalistic self-attribution may be realized by a mechanism that processes information about the functional profile of mental states, or their representational content, or both kinds of information (see Robbins 2006: 618; for a “neural” version of the inside access view, see below, §2a). A representationalist-functionalist version of the inside access view is Nichols & Stich’s (2003) account of first-person mindreading in terms of “monitoring mechanisms.” The authors begin by drawing a distinction between detection and inference. It is one thing to detect mental states, it is another to reason about mental states, that is, using information about mental states to predict and explain one’s own or other people’s mental states and behavior. Moreover, both the attribution of a mental state and the inferences that one can make about it can be referred to oneself or other people. Thus, we get four possible operations: first- and third-person detection, first- and third-person reasoning. Now, Nichols and Stich’s hypothesis is that whereas third-person detecting and first- and third-person reasoning are all subserved by the same theory of mind, the mechanism for detecting one’s own mental states is quite independent of the mechanism that deals with the mental states of other people. More precisely, the Monitoring Mechanism (MM) theory assumes the existence of a suite of distinct self-monitoring computational mechanisms, including one for monitoring and providing self-knowledge of one’s own experiential states, and one for monitoring and providing self-knowledge of one’s own propositional attitudes. Thus, for example, if X believes that p, and the proper MM is activated, it copies the representation p in X’s “Belief Box”, embeds the copy in a representation schema of the form “I believe that___”, and then places this second-order representation back in X’s Belief Box.

Since the MM theory assumes that first-person mindreading does not involve mechanisms of the sort that figure in third-person mindreading, it implies that the first capacity should be dissociable, both diachronically and synchronically, from the second. In support of this prediction Nichols & Stich (2003) cite developmental data to the effect that, on a wide range of tasks, instead of the parallel performance predicted by TT, children exhibit developmental asynchronies. For example, children are capable of attributing knowledge and ignorance to themselves before they are capable of attributing those states to others (Wimmer et al. 1988). Moreover, they suggest—on the basis, inter alia, of a reinterpretation of the aforementioned Hurlburt, Happé & Frith’s (1994) data—that there is some evidence of a double dissociation between schizophrenic and autistic subjects: the MMs might be intact in autistics despite their impairment in third-person mindreading; in schizophrenics the pattern might be reversed.

The MM theory provides a neo-Cartesian reply to TT—and especially to its eliminativist implications inasmuch as the mentalistic self-attributions based on MMs are immune to the potentially distorting influence of our intuitive theory of psychology. However, the MM theory faces at least two difficulties. To start with, the theory must tell us how MM establishes which attitude type (or percept type) a given mental state belongs to (Goldman 2006: 238-9). A possibility is that there is a separate MM for each propositional attitude type and for each perceptual modality. But then, as Engelbert and Carruthers (2010: 246) remark, since any MM can be selectively impaired, the MM theory predicts a multitude of dissociations—for example, subjects who can self-attribute beliefs but not desires, or visual experiences but not auditory ones, and so on. However, the hypothesis of such a massive dissociability has little empirical plausibility.

Moreover, Carruthers (2011) has offered a book-length argument against the idea of a direct access to propositional attitudes. His neurocognitive framework is Bernard Baars’ Global Workspace Theory model of consciousness (see Gennaro 2005: §4c), in which a range of perceptual systems “broadcast” their outputs (for example, sensory data from the environment, imagery, somatosensory and proprioceptive data) to a complex of conceptual systems (judgment-forming, memory-forming, desire-forming, decision-making systems, and so forth). Among the conceptual systems there is also a multi-componential “mindreading system,” which generates higher-order judgments about the mental states of others and of oneself. By virtue of receiving globally broadcast perceptual states as input, the mindreading system can easily recognize those percepts, generating self-attributions of the form “I see something red,” “It hurts,” and so on. But the system receives no input from the systems that generate propositional attitude events (like judging and deciding). Consequently, the mindreading system cannot directly self-attribute propositional attitude events; it must infer them by exploiting the perceptual input (together with the outputs of various memory systems). Thus, Carruthers (2009: 124) concludes, “self-attributions of propositional attitude events like judging and deciding are always the result of a swift (and unconscious) process of self-interpretation.” On this perspective, therefore, we do not introspect our own propositional attitude events. Our only form of access to those events is via self-interpretation, turning our mindreading faculty upon ourselves and engaging in unconscious interpretation of our own behavior, physical circumstances, and sensory events like visual imagery and inner speech. Carruthers bases his proposal on considerations to do with the evolution of mindreading and metacognition, the rejection of the above-cited data that according to Nichols & Stich (2003) suggest developmental asynchronies and dissociation between self-attribution and other-attribution, and on evidence about the confabulation of attitudes. Thus, Carruthers develops a very sophisticated version of the symmetrical account of self-knowledge in which the theory-driven mechanisms underlying first- and third-person mindreading can count not only on observations and recollections of one’s own behavior and the circumstances in which it occurs/occurred, but also on the recognition of a multitude of perceptual and quasi-perceptual events.

2. Simulation-Theory

Until the mid-1980s the debate on the nature of mindreading was a debate between the different variants of TT. But in 1986, TT as a whole was impugned by Robert Gordon and, independently, by Jane Heal, who gave life to an alternative which was termed “simulation-theory” (ST). In 1989 Alvin Goldman and Paul Harris began to contribute to this new approach to mindreading. In 2006, Goldman provided the most thoroughly developed, empirically supported defense of a simulationist account of our mentalistic abilities.

According to ST, our third-person mindreading ability does not consist in implicit theorizing but rather in representing the psychological states and processes of others by mentally simulating them, that is, attempting to generate similar states and processes in ourselves. Thus, the same resources that are used in our own psychological states and processes are recycled—usually but not only in imagination—to provide an understanding of psychological states and processes of the simulated target. This has often been compared to the method of Einfühlung exalted by the theorists of Verstehen (see Stueber 2006: 5-19).

In order for a mindreader to engage in this process of imaginative recycling, various information processing mechanisms are needed. The mindreader simulates the psychological etiology of the actions of the target in essentially two steps. First, the simulator generates pretend or imaginary mental states in her own mind which are intended to (at least partly) correspond to those of the target. Second, the simulator feeds the imaginary states into a suitable cognitive mechanism (for example, the decision-making system) that is taken “offline,” that is, it is disengaged from the motor control systems. If the simulator’s decision-making system is similar to the target’s one, and the pretend mental states that the simulator introduces into the decision-making system (at least partly) match the target’s, then the output of the simulator’s decision-making system might reliably be attributed or assigned to the target. On this perspective, there is no need for an internally represented knowledge base and there is no need of a naïve theory of psychology. The simulator exploits a part of her cognitive apparatus as a model for a part of the simulated agent’s cognitive apparatus.

Hence follows one of the main advantages ST is supposed to have over TT—namely its computational parsimony. According to advocates of ST, the body of tacit folk-psychological knowledge which TT attributes to mindreaders imposes too heavy a burden on mental computation. However, such a load will diminish radically if, instead of computing the body of knowledge posited by TT, mindreaders must only co-opt mechanisms that are primarily used online, when they experience a kind of mental state, to run offline simulations of similar states in the target (the argument is suggested by Gordon 1986 and Goldman 1995, and challenged by Stich & Nichols 1992, 1995).

In the early years of the debate over ST, a main focus was on its implications for the controversy between intentional realism and eliminative materialism. Gordon (1986) and Goldman (1989) suggested that by rejecting the assumption that folk psychology is a theory, ST undercuts eliminativism. Stich & Ravenscroft (1994: §5), however, objected that ST undermines eliminativism only provided that the latter adopts the subpersonal version of TT. For ST does not deny the evident fact that human beings have intuitions about the mental, and neither rules out that such intuitions might be systematized by building, as David Lewis suggests, a theory that implies them. Consequently, ST does not refute eliminativism; it instead forces the eliminativist to include among the premises of her argument Lewis’ personal formulation of TT, together with the observation/prediction that the theory implicit in our everyday talk about mental states is or will turn out to be seriously defective.

One of the main objections that theory-theorists raise against ST is the argument from systematic errors in prediction. According to ST errors in prediction can arise either (i) because the predictor’s executive system is different from that of the target, or (ii) because the pretend mental states that the predictor has introduced into the executive system do not match the ones that actually motivate the target. However, Stich & Nichols (1992, 1995; see also Nichols et al. 1996) describe experimental situations in which the participants systematically fail to predict the behavior of targets, and in which it is unlikely that (i) or (ii) is the source of problem. Now, TT can easily explain such systematic errors in prediction: it is sufficient to assume that our naïve theory of psychology lacks the resources required to account for such situations. It is no surprise that a folk theory that is incomplete, partial, and in many cases seriously defective often causes predictive failures. But this option is obviously not available for ST: simulation-driven predictions are “cognitively impenetrable,” that is, they are not affected by the predictor’s knowledge or ignorance about psychological processes (see also Saxe 2005; and the replies by Gordon 2005 and Goldman 2006: 173-4).

More recently, however, a consensus seems to be emerging to the effect that mindreading involves both TT and ST. For example, Goldman (2006) grants a variety of possible roles for theorizing in the context of what he calls “high-level mindreading.” This is the imaginative simulation discussed so far, which is subject to voluntary control, is accessible to consciousness, and involves the ascription of complex mental states such as propositional attitudes. High-level simulation is a species of what Goldman terms “enactment imagination” (a notion that builds on Currie & Ravenscroft’s 2002 concept of “recreative imagination”). Goldman contrasts high-level mindreading to the “low-level mindreading,” which is unconscious, hard-wired, involves the attribution of structurally simple mental states such as face-based emotions (for example, joy, fear, disgust), and relies on simple imitative or mirroring processes (see, for example, Goldman & Sripada 2005). Now, theory definitely plays a role in high-level mindreading. In a prediction task, for example, theory may be involved in the selection of the imaginary inputs that will be introduced into the executive system. In this case, Goldman (2006: 44) admits, mindreading depends on the cooperation of simulation and theorizing mechanisms.

Goldman’s blend of ST and TT (albeit with a strong emphasis on the simulative component) is not the only “hybrid” account of mindreading: for other hybrid approaches, see Botterill & Carruthers (1999), Nichols & Stich (2003), and Perner & Kühberger (2006). And it is right to say that now the debate aims first of all to establish to what extent and in which processes theory or simulation prevails.

a. Simulation with and without Introspection

There is an aspect, however, that makes Goldman’s (2006) account of ST different from other hybrid theories of mindreading, namely the neo-Cartesian priority that he assigns to introspection. On his view, first-person mindreading both ontogenetically precedes and grounds third-person mindreading. Mindreaders need to introspectively access their offline products of simulation before they can project them onto the target. And this, Goldman claims, is a form of “direct access.”

In 1993 Goldman put forward a phenomenological version of the inside access view (see above, §1c), by arguing that introspection is a process of detection and classification of one’s (current) psychological states that does not depend at all on theoretical knowledge, but rather occurs in virtue of information about the phenomenological properties of such states. But in light of criticism (Carruthers 1996; Nichols & Stich 2003), in his 2006 book Goldman has remarkably reappraised the relevance of the qualitative component for the detection of psychological states, pointing out the centrality of the neural properties. Building on Craig’s (2002) account of interoception, as well as Marr’s and Biederman’s computational models of visual object recognition, Goldman now maintains that introspection is a perception-like process that involves a transduction mechanism that takes neural properties of mental states as input and outputs representations in a proprietary code (the introspective code, or the “I-code”). The I-code represents types of mental categories and classifies mental-state tokens in terms of those categories. Goldman also suggests some possible primitives of the I-code. So, for example, our coding of the concept of pain might be the combination of the “bodily feeling” parameter (a certain raw feeling) with the “preference” or “valence” one (a negative valence toward the feeling). Thus, the neural version of the inside access view is an attempt to solve the problem of the recognition of the attitude type, which proved problematic for Nichols and Stich’s representationalist-functionalist approach (see above, §1c). However, since different percept and attitude types are presumably realized in different cerebral areas, each percept or attitude type will depend on a specific informational channel to feed the introspective mechanism. Consequently, Goldman’s theory also seems to be open to the objection of massive dissociability raised to the MM theory (see Engelbert and Carruthers 2010: 247).

Goldman’s primacy of first-person mindreading is, however, rejected by other simulationists. According to Gordon’s (1995, 1996) “radical” version of ST, simulation can occur without introspective access to one’s own mental states. The simulative process begins not with my pretending to be the target, but rather with my becoming the target. As Gordon (1995: 54) puts it, simulation is not “a transfer but a transformation.” “I” changes its referent and the equivalence “I=target” is established. In virtue of this de-rigidification of the personal pronoun, any introspective step is ruled out: one does not first assign a psychological state to oneself to transfer it to the target. Since the simulator becomes the target, no analogical inference from oneself to the other is needed. Still more radically, simulation can occur without having any mentalistic concepts. Our basic competence in the use of utterances of the form “I <propositional attitude> that p” involves not direct access to the propositional attitudes, but only an “ascent routine” through which we express our propositional attitudes in this new linguistic form (see Gordon 2007).

Carruthers has raised two objections to Gordon’s radical ST. First, it is a “step back” to a form of “quasi-behaviorism” (Carruthers 1996: 38). Second, Gordon problematically assumes that our mentalistic abilities are constituted by language (Carruthers 2011: 225-27). In developmental psychology de Villiers & de Villiers (2003) have put forward a constitution-thesis similar to Gordon’s: thinking about mental states comes from internalizing the language with which these states are expressed in the child’s linguistic environment. More specifically, mastery of the grammatical rules for embedding tensed complement clauses under verbs of speech or cognition provides children with a necessary representational format for dealing with false beliefs. However, correlation between linguistic exposure and mindreading does not depend on the use of specific grammatical structures. In a training study Lohman & Tomasello (2003) found that performance on a false-belief task is enhanced by simply using perspective-shifting discourse, without any use of sentential complement syntax. Moreover, syntax is not constitutive of the mentalistic capacities of adults. Varley et al. (2001) and Apperly et al. (2006) provided clear evidence that adults with profound grammatical impairment show no impairments on non-verbal tests of mindreading. Finally, mastery of sentence complements is not even a necessary condition of the development of mindreading in children. Perner et al. (2005) have shown that such mastery may be required for statements about beliefs but not about desires (as in English), for beliefs and desires (as in German), or for neither beliefs nor desires (Chinese); and yet children who learn each of these three languages all understand and talk about desire significantly earlier than belief.

b. Simulation in Low-Level Mindreading

Another argument for a (prevalently) simulationist approach to mindreading consists in pointing out that TT is thoroughly limited to high-level mindreading (essentially the attribution of propositional attitudes), whereas ST is also well equipped to account for forms of low-level mindreading such as the perception of emotions or the recognition of facial expressions and motor intentions (see Slors & Macdonald 2008: 155).

This claim finds its main support in the interplay between ST and neuroscience. In the early 1990s mirror neurons were first described in the ventral premotor cortex and inferior parietal lobe of macaque monkeys. These visuomotor neurons activate not only when the monkey executes motor acts (such as grasping, manipulating, holding, and tearing objects), but also when it observes the same, or similar, acts performed by the experimenter or a conspecific. Although there is only one study that seems to offer direct evidence for the existence of mirror neurons in humans (Mukamel et al. 2010), many neurophysiological and brain imaging investigations support the existence of a human action mirroring system. For example, fMRI studies using action observation or imitation tasks demonstrated activation in areas in the human ventral premotor and parietal cortices assumed to be homologous to the areas in the monkey cortex containing mirror neurons (see Rizzolatti et al. 2002). It should be emphasized that most of the mirror neurons that discharge when a certain type of motor act is performed also activate when the same act is perceived, even though it is not performed with the same physical movement—for example, many mirror neurons that discharge when the monkey grasps food with the hand also activate when it sees a conspecific who grasps food with the mouth. This seems to suggest that mirror neurons code or represent an action at a high level of abstraction, that is, they are receptive not only to a mere movement but indeed to an action.

In 1998, Vittorio Gallese and Goldman wrote a very influential article in which mirror neurons were indicated as the basis of the simulative process. When the mirror neurons in the simulator’s brain are externally activated in observation mode, their activity matches (simulates or resonates with) that of mirror neurons in the target’s brain, and this resonance process retrodictively outputs a representation of the target’s intention from a perception of her movement.

More recently a number of objections have been raised against the “resonance” ST advocated by some researchers that have built on Gallese and Goldman’s hypothesis. Some critics, although admitting the presence of mirror neurons in both non-human and human primates, have drastically reappraised their role in mindreading. For example, Saxe (2009) has argued that there is no evidence that mirror neurons represent the internal states of the target rather than some relatively abstract properties of observed actions (see also Jacob & Jeannerod 2005; Jacob 2008). On the other hand, Goldman himself has mitigated his original position. Unlike Gallese, Keysers & Rizzolatti (2004), who propose mirror systems as the unifying basis of all social cognition, now Goldman (2006) considers mirror neuron activity, or motor resonance in general, as merely a possible part of low-level mindreading. Nonetheless, it is right to say that resonance phenomena are at the forefront of the field of social neuroscience (see Slors & Macdonald 2008: 156).

3. Social Cognition without Mindreading

By the early 21^st century, the primacy that both TT and ST assigns to mindreading in social cognition had been challenged. One line of attack has come from philosophers working in the phenomenological tradition, such as Shaun Gallagher, Matthew Ratcliffe, and Dan Zahavi (see Gallagher & Zahavi 2008). Others working more from the analytic tradition, such as Jose Luis Bermúdez (2005, 2006b), Dan Hutto (2008), and Heidi Maibom (2003, 2007) have made similar points. Let’s focus on Bermúdez’ contribution because he offers a very clear account of the kind of cognitive mechanisms that might subserve forms of social understanding and coordination without mindreading (for a brief overview of this literature, see Slors & Macdonald 2008; for an exhaustive examination, see Herschbach 2010).

Bermúdez (2005) argues that the role of high-level mindreading in social cognition needs to be drastically re-evaluated. We must rethink the traditional nexus between intelligent behavior and propositional attitudes, realizing that much social understanding and social coordination are subserved by mechanisms that do not capitalize on the machinery of intentional psychology. For example, a mechanism of emotional sensitivity such as “social referencing” is a form of low-level mindreading that subserve social understanding and social coordination without involving the attribution of propositional attitudes (see Bermúdez 2006a: 55).

To this point Bermúdez is on the same wavelength as simulationists and social neuroscientists in drawing our attention to forms of low-level mindreading that have been largely neglected by philosophers. However, Bermúdez goes a step beyond them and explores cases of social interactions that point in a different direction, that is, situations that involve mechanisms that can no longer be described as mindreading mechanisms. He offers two examples.

(1) In game theory there are social interactions that are modeled without assuming that the agents involved are engaged in explaining or predicting each other’s behavior. In social situations that have the structure of the iterated prisoner’s dilemma, the so-called “tit-for-tat” heuristic simply says: “start out cooperating and then mirror your partner’s move for each successive move” (Axelrod 1984). Applying this heuristic simply requires understanding the moves available to each player (cooperation or defection), and remembering what happened in the last round. So we have here a case of social interaction that is conducted on the basis of a heuristic strategy that looks backward to the results of previous interactions rather than to their psychological etiology. We do not need to infer other players’ reasons; we only have to coordinate our behavior with theirs.

(2) There is another important class of social interactions that involve our predicting and/or explaining the actions of other participants, but in which the relevant predictions and explanations seem to proceed without us having to attribute propositional attitudes. These social interactions rest on what social psychologists call “scripts” (“frames” in artificial intelligence), that is, complex information structures that allow predictions to be made on the basis of the specification of the purpose of some social practice (for example, eating a meal at a restaurant), the various individual roles, and the appropriate sequence of moves.

According to Bermúdez, then, much social interaction is enabled by a suite of relatively simple mechanisms that exploit purely behavioral regularities. It is important to notice that these mechanisms subserve central social cognition (in Fodor’s sense). Nevertheless, they implement relatively simple processes of template matching and pattern recognition, that is, processes that are paradigmatic cases of perceptual processing. For example, when a player A applies the tit-for-tat rule, A must determine what the other player B did in the preceding round. This can be implemented in virtue of a template matching in which A verifies that B’s behavioral pattern matches A’s prototype of cooperation and defection. And also detecting the social roles implicated in a script-based interaction is a case of template matching: one verifies whether the perceived behavior matches one of the templates associated with the script (or the prototype represented in the “frame”).

Bermúdez (2005: 223) notes that the idea that much of what we intuitively identify as central processing is actually implemented by mechanisms of template matching and pattern recognition has been repeatedly put forward by the advocates of the connectionist computationalism, especially by Paul M. Churchland. But unlike the latter, Bermúdez does not carry the reappraisal of the role of propositional attitudes in social cognition to the point of their elimination; he argues that social cognition does not involve high-level mindreading when the social world is “transparent” or “ready-to-hand,” as he says quoting Heidegger’s zuhanden. However, when we find ourselves in social situations that are “opaque,” that is, situations in which all the standard mechanisms of social understanding and interpersonal negotiation break down, it seems that we cannot help but appeal to the type of metarepresentational thinking characteristic of intentional psychology (2005: 205-6).

4. References and Further Reading

a. Suggested Further Reading

Apperly, I. (2010). Mindreaders: The Cognitive Basis of “Theory of Mind.” Hove, East Sussex, Psychology Press.
Carruthers, P. and Smith, P. K. (eds.) (1996). Theories of Theories of Mind. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Churchland, P. M. (1994). “Folk Psychology (2).” In S. Guttenplan (ed.), A Companion to the Philosophy of Mind, Oxford, Blackwell, pp. 308–316.
Cundall, M. (2008). “Autism.” In The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy..
Davies, M. and Stone, T. (eds.) (1995a). Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford, Blackwell.
Davies, M. and Stone, T. (eds.) (1995b). Mental Simulation: Evaluations and Applications. Oxford, Blackwell.
Decety, J. and Cacioppo, J. T. (2011). The Oxford Handbook of Social Neuroscience. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Doherty, M. J. (2009). Theory of Mind. How Children Understand Others’ Thoughts and Feelings. Hove, East Sussex, Psychology Press.
Dokic, J. and Proust, J. (eds.) (2002). Simulation and Knowledge of Action. Amsterdam, John Benjamins.
Gerrans, P. (2009). “Imitation and Theory of Mind.” In G. Berntson and J. T. Cacioppo (eds.), Handbook of Neuroscience for the Behavioral Sciences. Chicago, University of Chicago Press, vol. 2, pp. 905–922.
Gordon, R. M. (2009). “Folk Psychology as Mental Simulation.” In E. N. Zalta (ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2009 Edition).
Hutto, D., Herschbach, M. and Southgate, V. (eds.) (2011). Special Issue “Social Cognition: Mindreading and Alternatives.” Review of Philosophy and Psychology 2(3).
Kind, A. (2005). “Introspection.” In The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Meini, C. (2007). “Naïve psychology and simulations.” In M. Marraffa, M. De Caro and F. Ferretti (eds.), Cartographies of the Mind. Dordrecht, Kluwer, pp. 283–294.
Nichols, S. (2002). “Folk Psychology.” In Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science. London, Nature Publishing Group, pp. 134–140.
Ravenscroft, I. (2010). “Folk Psychology as a Theory.” In E. N. Zalta (ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2010 Edition).
Rizzolatti, G., Sinigaglia, C. and Anderson, F. (2007). Mirrors in the Brain. How Our Minds Share Actions, Emotions, and Experience. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Saxe, R. (2009). “The happiness of the fish: Evidence for a common theory of one’s own and others’ actions.” In K. D. Markman, W. M. P. Klein and J. A. Suhr (eds.), The Handbook of Imagination and Mental Simulation. New York, Psychology Press, pp. 257–266.
Shanton, K. and Goldman, A. (2010). “Simulation theory.” Wiley Interdisciplinary Reviews: Cognitive Science 1(4): 527–538.
Stich, S. and Rey, G. (1998). “Folk psychology.” In E. Craig (ed.), Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. London, Routledge.
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Weiskopf, D. A. (2011). “The Theory-Theory of Concepts.” In The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

b. References

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Author Information

Massimo Marraffa
Email: marraffa@uniroma3.it
University Roma Tre
Italy

Omnipotence

Omnipotence is the property of being all-powerful; it is one of the traditional divine attributes in Western conceptions of God. This notion of an all-powerful being is often claimed to be incoherent because a being who has the power to do anything would, for instance, have the power to draw a round square. However, it is absurd to suppose that any being, no matter how powerful, could draw a round square. A common response to this objection is to assert that defenders of divine omnipotence never intended to claim that God could bring about logical absurdities. This observation about what is not meant by omnipotence does little, however, to clarify just what is meant by that term. Philosophers have therefore attempted to state necessary and sufficient conditions for omnipotence.

These proposed analyses are evaluated by several criteria. First, it must be determined whether the property described by the analysis captures what theologians and ordinary religious believers mean when they describe God as omnipotent, almighty, or all-powerful. Omnipotence is thought to be a quite impressive property. Indeed, the traditional God’s omnipotence is one of the attributes that make Him worthy of worship. If, therefore, an analysis implies that certain conceivable beings who are not impressive with respect to their power count as omnipotent, then the analysis is inadequate.

Second, when a particular analysis does seem to be in line with the ordinary use of the term, the next question is whether the property described is self-consistent. For instance, many proposed analyses of omnipotence give inconsistent answers to the question of whether an omnipotent being could create a stone too heavy for it to lift. Third, it is necessary to determine whether omnipotence, so understood, could form part of a coherent total religious view. Some analyses of omnipotence require that an omnipotent being be able to do evil, or to break promises, but God has traditionally been regarded as unable to do these things. It has also been argued that the existence of an omnipotent being would be inconsistent with human freedom. Finally, divine omnipotence is one of the premises leading to the alleged contradiction in traditional religious belief known as the Logical Problem of Evil.

A successful analysis of omnipotence is one which captures the ordinary notion, is free from internal contradiction, and is compatible with the other elements of the religious view in which it is embedded.

The Self-Consistency of Omnipotence
Omnipotence and Necessary Moral Perfection
Omnipotence and Human Freedom
Omnipotence and the Problem of Evil
References and Further Reading

1. The Self-Consistency of Omnipotence

a. The Stone Paradox

Could an omnipotent being create a stone too heavy for it to lift? More generally, could an omnipotent being make something it could not control (Mackie 1955: 210)? This question is known as the Paradox of the Stone, or the Paradox of Omnipotence. It appears that answering either “yes” or “no” will mean that the being in question is not omnipotent after all. For suppose that the being cannot create the stone. Then it seems that it is not omnipotent, for there is something that it cannot do. But suppose the being can create the stone. Then, again, there is something it cannot do, namely, lift the stone it has created.

Although the argument is usually initially stated in this form, as it stands it is not quite valid. From the fact that a particular being is able to create a stone it cannot lift, it does not follow that there is in fact something that that being cannot do. It only follows that if the being were to create the stone, then there would be something it could not do. As a result, the paradox is a problem only for necessary omnitemporal omnipotence, that is, for the view that there is a being who exists necessarily and is necessarily omnipotent at every time (Swinburne 1973; Meierding 1980). There is no problem for a being who is only omnipotent at certain times, because the being in question might very well be omnipotent prior to creating the stone (but not after). Furthermore, the stone paradox provides no reason to suppose there could not be a contingently omnitemporally omnipotent being; all the being in question would need to do is to decide not to create the stone, and then it would be omnipotent at every time. Nevertheless, the Stone Paradox is of interest because necessary omnitemporal omnipotence has traditionally been attributed to God.

The Stone Paradox has been the main focus of those attempting to specify exactly what an omnipotent being could, and could not, do. However, even for those who do not wish to insist on necessary omnitemporal omnipotence, a number of questions arise. Could an omnipotent being draw a square circle? Descartes notoriously answered “yes.” However, the Western philosophical and theological traditions have, at least since Aquinas, almost universally given the opposite answer. The view that an omnipotent being could do absolutely anything, even the logically absurd, is known as voluntarism.

Simply rejecting voluntarism does not give an answer to the Stone Paradox. Creating a stone too heavy for its creator to lift is a possible task. Another possible task which an omnipotent being can apparently not perform is coming to know that one has never been omnipotent. For human beings, this is a fairly simple task, but for an omnipotent being it would seem to be impossible. The general problem is this: The fact that it is logically possible that some being perform a specified task (the task itself does not contain a contradiction) does not guarantee that it is logically possible for an omnipotent being to perform that task. Coming to know that one has never been omnipotent is an example of a single task that is logically possible for some being perform, but which is logically impossible for an omnipotent being to perform. The Stone Paradox provides an example of two tasks (creating a stone its creator cannot lift and lifting the stone one has just created) such that each task is logically possible, but it is logically impossible for one task to be performed immediately after the other.

In order to meet these challenges, it is necessary to say something more precise than to simply affirm that an omnipotent being would be able to do whatever is possible. These more precise theories can be divided into two classes: act theories, which say that an omnipotent being would be able to perform any action; and result theories, which say that an omnipotent being would be able to bring about any result.

b. Voluntarism

René Descartes, almost alone in the tradition of Western theology, held that God could do anything, even affirming that “God could have brought it about … that it was not true that twice four make eight” (Descartes 1984-1991: 2:294). If this doctrine is adopted, then the Stone Paradox is dissolved: If an omnipotent being could make contradictions true, then an omnipotent being could make a stone too heavy for it to lift and still lift it (Frankfurt 1964). However, this doctrine is of questionable coherence. To cite just one difficulty, it would seem to follow from the claim that God could make 2 x 4 = 9 that possibly God makes 2 x 4 = 9. However, it is a necessary truth that if God makes 2 x 4 = 9, then 2 x 4 = 9. In standard modal logics, possibly p and necessarily if p then q together entail possibly q, so it seems to follow that possibly 2 x 4 = 9.

Descartes does not accept this consequence, but it is not clear how he can avoid it. It has been suggested that he may be implicitly committed to the rejection of one or more widely accepted modal axioms (Curley 1984). These sorts of absurdities have led to the nearly universal rejection of voluntarism by philosophers and theologians.

c. Act Theories

Once voluntarism is rejected, it is necessary to specify more precisely what is meant by saying that an omnipotent being could do anything. One natural way of doing this is to give a definition of the form:

S is omnipotent =df S can perform any action A such that C

where C specifies some conditions A must satisfy. Such theories of omnipotence may be conveniently referred to as act theories. The simplest (non-voluntarist) act theory is:

(1) S is omnipotent =df S can perform any action A such that A is possible

This act theory deals with the problem of drawing a round square and making 2 x 4 = 9: these are not possible actions. There is some difficulty in saying exactly which acts should count as possible, and this threatens to make the condition too weak. For instance, a being who could perform only physically possible actions would not be omnipotent. The usual response, dating back at least to Aquinas, is to say that an action is possible, in the relevant sense, if and only if it consistent, that is, if it is not self-contradictory.

The Stone Paradox is most effective against act theories. Making a stone one cannot lift is a possible action, so, in order to count as omnipotent according to (1), a being must be able to perform it. However, if any being performs this task then there is a possible task which that being cannot perform immediately afterward, namely, lifting the stone one has just made. It might be objected that this task is not possible for the being in question, but this qualification is not permitted by (1). Definition (1) requires that an omnipotent being should be able to perform any logically possible action, that is, any action which could possibly be performed by any being at all, in any circumstances at all. It is clearly possible that some being perform the action lifting the stone one has just made, so, according to (1), a being who had just performed the action making a stone one cannot lift could not possibly be omnipotent.

This is not a problem for a being who is only contingently omnipotent: such a being might perform the first task, thereby ceasing to be omnipotent, and so be unable to perform the second task, or the being might refrain from performing the first task, and so continue to be omnipotent. However, the Paradox does show that on the contemplated theory no being could be necessarily omnitemporally omnipotent.

It has sometimes been thought that this problem could be solved simply by recognizing that creating a stone an omnipotent being cannot lift is an impossible action, and therefore an omnipotent being need not be able to perform it (Mavrodes 1963). However, this line of objection fails to recognize that, in addition to the impossible action creating a stone an omnipotent being cannot lift, there are also such possible actions as creating a stone one cannot lift and creating a stone its creator cannot lift.

There are further problems. Possible actions also include coming to know that one has never been omnipotent, which, since no one can know falsehoods, no omnipotent being could do. Additionally, this kind of view causes problems for various traditional religious views, such as the assertion by the author of the Epistle to the Hebrews that it is “impossible for God to lie” (Hebrews 6:18) since lying is a possible action.

Medieval philosophers prior to Aquinas often attempted to deal with this problem by claiming that an omnipotent being could perform any action which does not require a defect or infirmity. However, there was very little success in spelling out the meaning of this assertion (Ross 1969: 196-202). Here is a definition which cpatures the basic idea of these Medieval analyses:

(2) S is omnipotent =df S can perform any action A such that it is logically possible that S does A.

This is similar to the Medieval suggestion since, according to classical theology, God is necessarily without defect or infirmity, so that, if the action A requires a defect or infirmity, (2) does not require that God, in order to count as omnipotent, should be able to do it. However, (2) runs into the famous ‘McEar’ counter-example (Plantinga 1967: 170; La Croix 1977: 183). Suppose that it is a necessary truth about a certain being, known as McEar, that the only action he performs is scratching his ear. It follows that, if McEar can scratch his ear, he is omnipotent, despite his inability to do anything else. This result is clearly unacceptable.

One response, considered by Alvin Plantinga and advocated by Richard La Croix, is to claim merely that an otherwise God-like being who satisfied this definition would be omnipotent. If the concept of God is otherwise coherent, then this claim is probably true. It also has the benefit of being guaranteed not to create any inconsistencies, for it is built into the definition that God has power only to perform those actions such that it is possible that he perform them. However, to adopt this strategy is to give up on the project of providing a general analysis of omnipotence. Furthermore, this claim, on its own, does not answer the question of the Stone Paradox: is it possible for God to create a stone he cannot lift?

Although not everyone agrees that La Croix’s response is satisfactory, it is widely held that the prospects are not good for a consistent general definition or analysis of omnipotence in terms of acts (Ross 1969: 202-210; Geach 1973; Swinburne 1973; Sobel 2004: ch. 9).

d. Result Theories

The main alternatives to act theories of omnipotence are result theories, theories which analyze omnipotence in terms of the results an omnipotent being would be able to bring about. These results are usually thought of as states of affairs or possible worlds. A possible state of affairs is a way the world could be. Philosophers also sometimes recognize impossible states of affairs, that is, ways the world could not be. For instance, the sky’s being blue is a possible state of affairs, and John’s being a married bachelor is an impossible state of affairs. A possible world is a maximal consistent state of affairs, a complete way the world could be.

Equivalent, or approximately equivalent, result theories can be stated in terms either of states of affairs or of possible worlds. The simplest (non-voluntarist) result theory can be stated, in terms of possible worlds, as follows:

(3) S is omnipotent =df S can bring about any possible world

In other words, for any comprehensive way the world could be, an omnipotent being could bring it about that the world was that way. This account of omnipotence was first clearly laid out and endorsed by Leibniz, who pioneered the philosophical use of the notion of a possible world (Leibniz 1985: sects. 7-8, 52, 416). More recently, James Ross has advocated a similar account, though Ross prefers a formulation in terms of states of affairs (Ross 1969: 210-213):

(4) S is omnipotent =df for every contingent state of affairs p, whether p is the case is logically equivalent to the effective choice, by S, that p

Since every state of affairs must either obtain or not, and since two contradictory states of affairs cannot both obtain, an omnipotent being would have to will some maximal consistent set of contingent states of affairs (Ross 1980: 614), that is, some one possible world. Ross’s definition therefore entails Leibniz’s.

The Leibniz-Ross theory neatly handles all of the objections raised against act theories. First, the Stone Paradox depends on the existence of reflexive actions, that is, actions whose descriptions refer back to the actor. Although states of affairs can refer to agents, a state of affairs does not have an actor. Thus, the phrase ‘there being a stone one cannot lift’ fails to specify a state of affairs, since there is no actor for “one” to refer to. In order to specify a state of affairs, it is necessary to replace “one” with some expression that defines which agent or agents cannot lift the stone. However, there being a stone an omnipotent being cannot lift is clearly not a possible state of affairs. An omnipotent being could therefore not bring it about. On the other hand, there being a stone its creator cannot lift is a possible state of affairs, and could be brought about by an omnipotent being, under the Leibniz-Ross theory, for an omnipotent being could bring it about that some other being created a stone which that being could not lift. Therefore, the Stone Paradox is not a problem for the Leibniz-Ross theory.

The Leibniz-Ross theory is likewise invulnerable to the objection regarding coming to know that one is not omnipotent, for, in this theory, an omnipotent being must be essentially omnipotent, and it is not possible that an essentially omnipotent being should come to know that it is not omnipotent. Therefore, as in the stone case, the omnipotent being could bring about someone’s coming to know that she is not omnipotent, but not an omnipotent being’s coming to know that it is not omnipotent. Finally, no analog to the McEar objection arises for the Leibniz-Ross theory.

While there are no obvious contradictions involved in the Leibniz-Ross theory, there are a number of metaphysical consequences which some have thought odd and, indeed, absurd. First, the Leibniz-Ross theory implies that an omnipotent being exists necessarily. According to Leibniz’s formulation, an omnipotent being would be able to actualize any possible world, but it is absurd to suppose that an omnipotent being should actualize a world in which it never existed. It follows that no such world is possible. On Ross’s formulation, the obtaining of any state of affairs is logically equivalent to its being chosen by an omnipotent being. Therefore, the obtaining of the state of affairs of no omnipotent being ever existing is logically equivalent to an omnipotent being effectively choosing that no omnipotent being should ever exist, but if no omnipotent being ever exists, then no omnipotent being ever chooses. As a result, the state of affairs of no omnipotent being ever existing cannot possibly obtain (Ross 1969: 213-214). Leibniz and Ross are both proponents of the ontological argument for the existence of God, so they both regard this as a benefit of this theory of omnipotence. Others have, however, found it implausible.

Although many people find it intuitive to suppose that there are possible worlds in which there is no omnipotent being, the Leibniz-Ross theory of omnipotence rules out this possibility. The Leibniz-Ross theory may narrow the space of possible worlds even further, for God, the being Leibniz and Ross believe to be omnipotent, is also supposed to be necessarily morally perfect, and there are worlds which intuitively seem possible which a necessarily morally perfect being could not, it seems, create–for instance, worlds in which the only sentient creatures suffer excruciating pain throughout every moment of their existence. On the Leibniz-Ross theory, if the omnipotent being could not create these worlds, then these worlds are not possible.

Furthermore, the Leibniz-Ross theory entails that an omnipotent being not only cannot create beings it cannot control, but cannot create beings it does not control (Mann 1977). In the Leibniz-Ross theory, an omnipotent being must choose every state of affairs which is to obtain, including all of the choices of its creatures. This is often thought to be a serious threat to human freedom.

All of these concerns with the Leibniz-Ross theory point the same direction: the suggestion that there are logically possible states of affairs which it is nevertheless logically impossible that an omnipotent being, or an omnipotent being who also has the other traditional divine attributes, should actualize. This line of reasoning has led Plantinga to dub the view that God can actualize any possible world “Leibniz’s Lapse” (Plantinga 1974: 180-184).

There is disagreement about exactly which, or how many, possible states of affairs cannot possibly be brought about by an omnipotent being. For instance, philosophers disagree about whether the claim that an omnipotent being exists is necessarily true, necessarily false, or contingent. If it is a contingent matter whether an omnipotent being exists, then the state of affairs of no omnipotent being ever existing is possible, but nevertheless cannot possibly be brought about by an omnipotent being. Perhaps the most widely accepted examples, and those Plantinga focuses on, are statements about the free choices of creatures. Plantinga believes that it is logically impossible that any being other than Caesar should bring about the possible state of affairs such as Caesar’s freely choosing not to cross the Rubicon, for if Caesar’s not crossing the Rubicon had been brought about by some other being (for example, God), then Caesar would not have freely chosen.

If it is accepted that there are some possible states of affairs which it is impossible that an omnipotent being should bring about, a more complicated analysis of omnipotence is needed. An obvious candidate is:

(5) S is omnipotent =df S can bring about any state of affairs p such that it is logically possible that S brings about p

However, this brings back the McEar objection, which the Leibniz-Ross theory had escaped. It is essential to McEar that he never bring about anything other than his own scratching of his ear. It is therefore impossible that McEar bring about some other state of affairs. As a result, this definition, once again, wrongly counts McEar as omnipotent, provided only that he is able to scratch his ear. Some philosophers have responded by arguing that there could not possibly be such a being as McEar (Wierenga 1983: 374-375). Others have given up on the project of giving a general analysis of omnipotence (La Croix 1977). Still others have advocated theories of omnipotence which make special accommodation to creaturely freedom (Flint and Freddoso 1983).

An entirely different approach to the problem is advocated by Erik J. Wielenberg (2000). According to Wielenberg, omnipotence cannot be analyzed simply by consideration of which states of affairs an omnipotent being could or could not bring about. Instead, it is necessary to consider why the being could or could not bring them about. Wielenberg proposes the following analysis:

(6) S is omnipotent =df there is no state of affairs p such that S is unable to bring about p at least partially due to lack of power

This analysis avoids attributing omnipotence to McEar since McEar’s limitation seems to be at least in part due to lack of power. It also solves the problem of the consistency of God’s inability to do evil with omnipotence, since God’s inability to do evil is not due to lack of power. Finally, according to Wielenberg, if it is really true that even an omnipotent being could not bring about Caesar’s freely choosing not to cross the Rubicon, then this must be due not to lack of power, but to the logic of the situation. The chief limitation of Wielenberg’s account is that it makes use of some unanalyzed notions whose analysis philosophers have found quite difficult. These are the notion of lack of power and the notion of one state of affairs obtaining partially due to another state of affairs obtaining. Without analyses of these notions, it is hard to tell whether Wielenberg’s analysis is self-consistent and whether it is consistent with other traditional divine attributes.

e. Omnipotence and Time

The Leibniz-Ross theory entails that the exercise of omnipotent power cannot occur within time. This is because, in this view, to exercise omnipotent power is to choose some particular possible world to be actual. To think of such a choice as occurring in time would be to imagine that some possible world could, at some particular time, become actual, having previously been merely possible. This, however, is absurd (Ross 1980: 621). Therefore, on the Leibniz-Ross theory, an omnipotent being can act only atemporally.

The notion of an atemporal action has, however, been found difficult. To give just one example of such a difficulty, it is widely held that acting requires one to be the cause of certain effects. However, many philosophers have also held that it is part of the concept of a cause that it must occur before its effects. Since something atemporal is neither before nor after anything else, there cannot be an atemporal cause, and, therefore, there cannot be an atemporal action.

On the other hand, even apart from the Leibniz-Ross theory, there are difficulties with the notion of being omnipotent at a time. This is because there are contingent states of affairs about the past, but the notion of changing the past is generally agreed to be incoherent (see Time Travel). Thus, omnipotence at a point in time cannot be defined as, for instance, the ability to bring about any contingent state of affairs because, although many past states of affairs are contingent, nothing done in the present, even by an omnipotent being, could possibly bring about a past state of affairs.

Richard Swinburne has proposed an analysis of omnipotence at a point in time based on definition (5) above (Swinburne 1973):

(7) S is omnipotent at time t =df S is able at t to bring about any state of affairs p such that it is consistent with the facts about what happened before t that, after t, S should bring about p

If the notion of changing the past is incoherent, then (7) does not require that an omnipotent being be able to change the past. However, (7) inherits (5)’s flaw when it comes to McEar: Since it is inconsistent to suppose that McEar (who, by hypothesis, is necessarily such that he only scratches his ear) does something other than scratch his ear, he need not have the power to do anything else in order to count as omnipotent. Additionally, there are well-known problems with specifying which facts are about the past. For instance, consider the fact that the U.S. Declaration of Independence was issued 232 years before President Obama took office. It is difficult to say whether this is a fact about 1776 or about 2008. (Intuitively, it is about both.) In order for (7) to succeed in dealing with the difficulties of temporal omnipotence, there must be a distinction between those facts which are, and those which are not, about the past. However, relational facts like the one under discussion show that it is quite difficult to draw this distinction.

Some philosophers have attempted to meet this difficulty head-on by adopting particular theories of temporal facts (Flint and Freddoso 1983), while others have tried to sidestep the concern by formulating theories of temporal omnipotence which do not require a distinction between past and non-past facts. For instance, Gary Rosenkrantz and Joshua Hoffman advocate the following analysis (Rosenkrantz and Hoffman 1980):

(8) S is omnipotent at t =df S is able at t to bring about any state of affairs p such that possibly some agent brings about p, and p is unrestrictedly repeatable

Rosenkrantz and Hoffman introduce a number of further qualifications, but the central point of their account is the notion of unrestricted repeatability. Intuitively, an unrestrictedly repeatable state of affairs is one that can obtain, cease to obtain, and then obtain again indefinitely many times, throughout all of history. Mt. Vesuvius’s erupting is unrestrictedly repeatable, but Mt. Vesuvius’s erupting prior to 1900 is not, since the latter cannot obtain at any time after 1900. Rosenkrantz and Hoffman hold that an omnipotent being could, before 1900, have brought about Mt. Vesuvius’s erupting prior to 1900 by, at that time, bringing about Mt. Vesuvius’s erupting. After 1900, an omnipotent being could still bring about the latter state of affairs, though not the former. Since the former state of affairs is not unrestrictedly repeatable, the inability to bring it about after 1900 is no bar to a being’s counting as omnipotent.

2. Omnipotence and Necessary Moral Perfection

According to the New Testament, “God cannot be tempted with evil” (James 1:13) and it is “impossible for God to lie” (Hebrews 6:18). Traditionally, these divine inabilities are taken quite seriously, and are said to follow from God’s attribute of impeccability or necessary moral perfection. According to this view, it is impossible for God to do evil. It seems, however, that no being could be both omnipotent and necessarily morally perfect, since an omnipotent being could do anything, but there are many things a necessarily morally perfect being could not do.

The argument can be formulated as follows (Morriston 2001: 144). Consider some particularly evil state of affairs, E, such as every sentient being suffering excruciating pain throughout its entire existence. Then:

(1) If any being is necessarily morally perfect, then there is no possible world at which that being brings about E

(2) If any being is omnipotent, then that being has the power to bring about E

(3) If any being has the power to bring about E, then there is some possible world at which that being brings about E

Therefore,

(4) No being is both necessarily morally perfect and omnipotent

Some theists have simply accepted the conclusion, replacing either necessary moral perfection or omnipotence with some weaker property. For instance, Nelson Pike famously argued that, although no being would deserve the title “God” unless that being were morally perfect, there are nevertheless possible worlds in which the being who is in fact God is not morally perfect, and therefore is not God (Pike 1969). Pike’s view is, in essence, a rather complicated version of the claim that God is only contingently morally perfect, a view which some have regarded as extremely objectionable from a theological standpoint (Geach 1977).

A number of philosophers who have accepted the incompatibility of omnipotence with necessary moral perfection have regarded the latter as more central to religious notions of God, and have argued that divine omnipotence should therefore be rejected (Geach 1977; Morriston 2001; Funkhouser 2006).

Defenders of the compatibility of omnipotence and necessary moral perfection must deny at least one of the premises of the argument, and, indeed, each of them has been denied. Premise (1) is perhaps the most difficult to reject. To be necessarily morally perfect is to be morally perfect in every possible world, but there seem to be some states of affairs such that bringing them about is inconsistent with moral perfection, and so it seems that if any being is necessarily morally perfect, then there are some states of affairs which that being does not bring about in any possible world. However, defenders of certain sorts of divine command theories of ethics are committed to the claim that God is morally perfect only in a trivial sense, and these views will have the result that (1) is false. If what is morally good depends on God’s choice, then, if God chose something else, that something else would be morally good. If this is right, then (1) is false: God could bring about E, but if he did bring about E, then E would be morally good. However, most philosophers regard this line of thought as tending to show the absurdity of these versions of divine command theory, rather than the falsity of (1).

Premise (2) can be rejected by those philosophers who regard omnipotence as the ability to perform any action or bring about any result which is consistent with the actor’s nature, as in definitions (2), (5), and (7). However, these definitions fall prey to the McEar objection and, more generally, open the door to all kinds of limitations on what an omnipotent being can do.

Many philosophers of action take it as an axiom that there are no necessarily unexercised powers (or abilities, or capacities), and (3) is merely an instance of this general principle. Nevertheless, the rejection of (3) is defended by Wielenberg (2000), who argues by means of the following analogy. Suppose that Hercules is “omni-strong” that is, he has sufficient strength to lift stones of any weight. Suppose, however, that a certain stone is too slippery for him to get a grip on. He therefore cannot lift it. Hercules’ inability to lift the slippery stone does not count against his omni-strength, since the stone is not too heavy for him, but only too slippery.

In the same way, Wielenberg argues, there are many things which it is not possible for God to do. However, God is omnipotent, since it is not for lack of power that God is unable to do these things, but for other reasons, such as his necessary moral perfection. The aptness of Wielenberg’s analogy is still open to dispute, and the principle that there are no necessarily unexercised powers continues to be widely accepted.

3. Omnipotence and Human Freedom

It is sometimes argued that if the existence of an omnipotent agent is possible, then the existence of a non-omnipotent free agent is impossible. According to this line of thought, if Caesar was free, then Caesar, and only Caesar, could have brought about Caesar’s freely refraining from crossing the Rubicon. However, if Caesar could have brought about that state of affairs, then it must be a possible state of affairs, and an omnipotent being could therefore bring it about. This, however, cannot be correct, for if someone other than Caesar brought about Caesar’s refraining, then Caesar would not have refrained freely. Therefore, an omnipotent being could not bring about this state of affairs. But if even an omnipotent being could not bring it about, then surely Caesar, who is not omnipotent, could not bring it about either. Therefore, Caesar was not free and, by parity of reasoning, neither is any other non-omnipotent agent.

The Leibniz-Ross theory renders the problem even more acute. According to Leibniz, God chooses precisely which possible world will obtain. God, therefore, chooses whether Caesar will cross the Rubicon. However, if someone else chooses what Caesar will do, then Caesar is not free. Similarly, for Ross, Caesar’s crossing the Rubicon is logically equivalent to God’s effectively choosing that Caesar cross the Rubicon. The choice is up to God. It is therefore not up to Caesar, at least not in the sense which (according to some philosophers) is required for free will.

Neither Leibniz nor Ross finds this objection particularly troubling. According to Leibniz, since it is possible that Caesar freely refrain from crossing the Rubicon, there must be a possible world which represents him as doing so. In making a world actual, God does not in any way change the intrinsic character of that world (Leibniz 1985: sect. 52). As a result, had God brought about that world, Caesar would still have been free. Similarly, Ross suggests that whatever sort of independence from external determination freedom requires, it certainly does not require that the agent’s choice be independent of its own logical entailments. However, in his view, God’s effectively choosing that the agent so choose is logically equivalent to the agent’s so choosing, and so cannot be inconsistent with freedom (Ross 1980: sect. 2).

Compatibilists about free will may be satisfied with the responses given by Leibniz and Ross. Libertarians, however, have generally not been satisfied, and have argued that an omnipotent being need not have the power to bring about such states of affairs as Caesar’s freely refraining from crossing the Rubicon. Most of those who have been so concerned have followed an approach developed by Plantinga (1974: ch. 9). This approach hinges on the existence of a class of propositions known as counterfactuals of freedom. A counterfactual of freedom is a statement about what an individual would freely choose if faced with a certain hypothetical circumstance. For instance, the claim, “If Caesar were offered a bribe of fifty talents, he would freely refrain from crossing the Rubicon,” is a counterfactual of freedom. Now, suppose that Brutus wants Caesar to freely refrain. If he uses force to prevent Caesar from crossing the Rubicon, then he has not succeeded in bringing it about that Caesar freely refrains, for in this case, Caesar’s refraining has been brought about by Brutus and not by Caesar, and so Caesar did not do it freely. This sort of bringing about is known as strongly actualizing. Only Caesar can strongly actualize Caesar’s freely refraining from crossing the Rubicon. However, if Brutus knows that if Caesar were offered the bribe, he would freely refrain, then there is a sense in which Brutus can bring it about that Caesar freely refrains: Brutus can strongly actualize the state of affairs Caesar’s being offered the bribe, and he knows that if he does this then Caesar will freely refrain. In such a case, Brutus would be said to have weakly actualized Caesar’s freely refraining.

According to Plantinga, in order for creatures to be free, it must not be up to anyone else which counterfactuals of freedom are true of them, so even an omnipotent being could not bring it about that particular counterfactuals of freedom are true. However, an omnipotent being could presumably bring it about that it knows the true counterfactuals of freedom (or if the omnipotent being was also essentially omniscient, then it would already know), and it could presumably strongly actualize many of their antecedents, and so weakly actualize a variety of states of affairs in which non-omnipotent beings acted freely. An omnipotent being could not, however, weakly actualize just any possible state of affairs. For instance, if there were no possible circumstance such that, if Caesar were in that circumstance, he would freely refrain from crossing the Rubicon, then even an omnipotent being could not weakly actualize Caesar’s freely refraining.

Among those who accept Plantinga’s arguments, some have attempted to analyze omnipotence in terms of what an omnipotent being could strongly actualize, and made appropriate qualifications for free actions. It is typically pointed out that it is logically impossible for any being to strongly actualize a state of affairs in which another being makes a free choice, and it suffices for omnipotence that a being be able to strongly actualize those states of affairs which it is logically possible that that being should strongly actualize (Wierenga 1983). This approach, however, runs into McEar-style counterexamples. Others have attempted to analyze omnipotence in terms of what an omnipotent being could weakly actualize. Flint and Freddoso (1983) require that an omnipotent being S be able to weakly actualize any possibly actualized state of affairs which is consistent with the counterfactuals of freedom about beings other than S. However, as Graham Oppy has pointed out, Flint and Freddoso’s analysis also seems to make omnipotence too easy, since on Flint and Freddoso’s account a being who could not strongly actualize such mundane states of affairs as a five-pound stone’s being lifted or a barn’s being painted red could turn out to be omnipotent if it was able to weakly actualize them (Oppy 2004, 74-75).

4. Omnipotence and the Problem of Evil

Divine omnipotence is typically used as a key premise in the famous argument against the existence of God known as the Logical Problem of Evil. The argument can be formulated as follows:

(1) An omnipotent being would be able to bring about any possible world

(2) Given the opportunity to bring about some world, a morally perfect being would only bring about the best world available to it

(3) The actual world is not the best possible world

Therefore,

(4) The actual world was not brought about by a being who is both omnipotent and morally perfect

The argument is here formulated in Leibnizian terms, and Leibniz notoriously rejected premise (3). Premise (2) has also been rejected: some philosophers have denied that there is a unique best possible world and others, most notably Robert Adams, have argued that even if there is such a world, creating it might not be the best course of action (Adams 1972). However, the premise that is of present concern is (1). Although (1) is accepted by Leibniz and Ross, considerations related to necessary moral perfection and human freedom have led many philosophers to reject it. This is the central premise of Plantinga’s Free Will Defense against the Logical Problem of Evil (Plantinga 1974, ch. 9): If there are worlds that God, though omnipotent, cannot bring about, then the best possible world might be one of these. If this is so, then, despite being both omnipotent and morally perfect, God would bring about a world which was less than the best, such as, perhaps, the actual world.

5. References and Further Reading

Adams, Robert Merrihew (1972). Must God create the best? Philosophical Review 81 (3):317-332.
Aquinas, St. Thomas. 1921 [1274]. The summa theologica of St. Thomas Aquinas. 2nd ed. Trans. Fathers of the English Dominican Province. London: Burns Oates & Washbourne.
- Part 1, Qu. 25, Art. 3 argues that omnipotence should be understood as the ability to do anything that is absolutely possible, that is, that does not imply a contradiction.
Cowan, J. L. 1965. The paradox of omnipotence. Analysis 25:102-108.
- Argues, against Mavrodes 1963, that the Stone Paradox cannot be solved by claiming that God can perform only logically possible tasks.
Curley, E. M. 1984. Descartes on the creation of the eternal truths. The Philosophical Review 93:569-597.
Descartes, Rene. 1984-1991 [1619-1649]. The philosophical writings of Descartes. Trans. JohnCottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch, and Anthony Kenny. 3 vols. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Defends voluntarism, the thesis that God can do literally anything, even draw a round square. See 2:294 (Sixth Replies) and 3:23-26 (letters to Mersenne).
Flint, Thomas P., and Alfred J. Freddoso. 1983. Maximal power. In The existence and nature of God, ed. Alfred J. Freddoso. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
- Combines the apparatus of Plantinga 1974 with an Ockhamist account of foreknowledge to develop a result theory sensitive to issues about time and freedom.
Frankfurt, Harry G. 1964. The logic of omnipotence. Philosophical Review 73 (2): 262-263.
- Points out that if, as Descartes supposed, God can do the logically impossible, then God can create a stone too heavy for him to lift and still lift it.
Funkhouser, Eric. 2006. On privileging God’s moral goodness. Faith and Philosophy 23 (4): 409-422.
- Argues that omnipotence is incompatible with necessary moral perfection, and that omnipotence is not a perfection, and therefore should not be attributed to God.
Geach, P. T. 1973. Omnipotence. Philosophy 48 (183): 7-20.
- Considers four theories of omnipotence and argues that they are all unacceptable.
La Croix, Richard R. 1977. The impossibility of defining ‘omnipotence’. Philosophical Studies 32 (2):181-190.
- Argues that every possible definition of omnipotence either renders omnipotence inconsistent with traditional divine attributes or falls prey to McEar-style counterexamples. This article is responsible for introducing the name ‘McEar.’
Leibniz, G. W. 1985 [1710]. Theodicy. Ed. Austin Farrer. Trans. E. M. Huggard. La Salle, Ill.: Open Court.
- Argues that God’s omnipotence consists in his ability to actualize any possible world, but God is impelled by a’moral necessity’ to choose the best.
Mackie, J. L. 1955. Evil and omnipotence. Mind 64 (254): 200-212.
- Argues that it is incoherent to suppose that a world containing evil was created by an omnipotent and perfectly good being.
Mann, William E. 1977. Ross on omnipotence. International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 8 (2):142-147.
- Shows that, given Ross’s theory of omnipotence (Ross 1969), an omnipotent being cannot freely decide to leave it up to others whether a certain state of affairs should obtain.
Mavrodes, George I. 1963. Some puzzles concerning omnipotence. Philosophical Review 72 (2):221-223.
- Argues that an omnipotent being could not create a stone so heavy he could not lift it, since the notion of a stone too heavy to be lifted by an omnipotent being is incoherent.
Meierding, Loren. 1980. The impossibility of necessary omnitemporal omnipotence. International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 11 (1): 21-26.
- Formalizes Swinburne’s argument that only necessary omnitemporal omnipotence is incoherent (Swinburne 1973).
Morriston, Wes. 2001. Omnipotence and necessary moral perfection: are they compatible? Religious Studies 37 (2): 143-160.
- Argues that no being could be both omnipotent and necessarily morally perfect.
Oppy, Graham. 2005. Omnipotence. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 71 (1): 58-84.
- Criticizes several recent theories of omnipotence (Rosenkrantz and Hoffman 1980; Flint and Freddoso 1983; Wierenga 1983) and argues that the God of ‘orthodox monotheism’ should not be regarded as omnipotent at all.
Pike, Nelson. 1969. Omnipotence and God’s ability to sin. American Philosophical Quarterly 6 (3):208-216.
- Argues that the individual who is in fact God is able to sin, but that the sentence ‘God sins’ is nevertheless necessarily false.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1967. God and other minds: a study of the rational justification of belief in God. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Ch. 7, sect. 2 introduced the ‘McEar’ counterexample to certain definitions of omnipotence (p. 170).
Plantinga, Alvin. 1974. The nature of necessity. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Chapter 9 argues that there are possible worlds which God, though omnipotent, cannot actualize.
Rosenkrantz, Gary, and Joshua Hoffman. 1980. What an omnipotent agent can do. International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 11 (1): 1-19.
- Defends a result theory according to which an omnipotent agent can actualize any unrestrictedly repeatable state of affairs.
Ross, James F. 1969. Philosophical theology. Indianapolis: Bobbs Merrill.
- Omnipotence is the topic of chapter 5. After a survey of Scholastic theories of omnipotence, Ross argues that no act theory of omnipotence can succeed. Ross then presents his own theory according to which a being is omnipotent if for any contingent state of affairs p, it is up to that being to choose whether p obtains.
Ross, James F. 1980. Creation. Journal of Philosophy 77 (10): 614-629.
- Further develops, and defends from objections, the account of omnipotence given in Ross 1969. Section 2 answers the objection that Ross’s theory leaves no room for human freedom (Mann 1977).
Swinburne, Richard. 1973. Omnipotence. American Philosophical Quarterly 10: 231-237.
- Argues that a result theory can, and an act theory cannot, defeat the Stone Paradox. However, it is conceded that the Paradox shows that no temporal being could be essentially omnipotent.
Wielenberg, Erik J. 2000. Omnipotence again. Faith and Philosophy 17 (1): 26-47.
- Criticizes Wierenga 1983 and Flint and Freddoso 1983 and argues for a result theory according to which there is no state of affairs such that lack of power prevents an omnipotent being from actualizing it.
Wierenga, Edward R. 1983. Omnipotence defined. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 43 (3):363-375.
- Defends a result theory, and argues that a being like McEar is impossible.

Author Information

Kenneth L. Pearce
Email: kpearce@usc.edu
University of Southern California
U. S. A.

Edmund Husserl: Intentionality and Intentional Content

Edmund Husserl (1859—1938) was an influential thinker of the first half of the twentieth century. His philosophy was heavily influenced by the works of Franz Brentano and Bernard Bolzano, and was also influenced in various ways by interaction with contemporaries such as Alexius Meinong, Kasimir Twardowski, and Gottlob Frege. In his own right, Husserl is considered the founder of twentieth century Phenomenology with influence extending to thinkers such as Martin Heidegger, Jean-Paul Sartre, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, and to contemporary continental philosophy generally. Husserl’s philosophy is also being discussed in connection with contemporary research in the cognitive sciences, logic, the philosophy of language, and the philosophy of mind, as well as in discussions of collective intentionality. At the center of Husserl’s philosophical investigations is the notion of the intentionality of consciousness and the related notion of intentional content (what Husserl first called ‘act-matter’ and then the intentional ‘noema’). To say that thought is “intentional” is to say that it is of the nature of thought to be directed toward or about objects. To speak of the “intentional content” of a thought is to speak of the mode or way in which a thought is about an object. Different thoughts present objects in different ways (from different perspectives or under different descriptions) and one way of doing justice to this fact is to speak of these thoughts as having different intentional contents. For Husserl, intentionality includes a wide range of phenomena, from perceptions, judgments, and memories to the experience of other conscious subjects as subjects (inter-subjective experience) and aesthetic experience, just to name a few. Given the pervasive role he takes intentionality to play in all thought and experience, Husserl believes that a systematic theory of intentionality has a role to play in clarifying and founding most other areas of philosophical concern, such as the theory of consciousness, the philosophy of language, the philosophy of logic, epistemology, and the philosophies of action and value. This article presents the key elements of Husserl’s understanding of intentionality and intentional content, specifically as these are developed in his works Logical Investigations and Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy.

Intentionality: Background and General Considerations
1. Intentional Content
Logical Investigations
1. Intentionality in Logical Investigations
  1. Act-Character
  2. Act-Matter
2. Intentionality, Meaning and Expression in Logical Investigations
  1. Meaning and Expression
  2. Essentially Occasional Expressions: Indexicals
Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy: The Perceptual Noema
References and Further Reading
1. Works by Husserl
2. Secondary Sources

1. Intentionality: Background and General Considerations

Franz Brentano (1838—1917) is generally credited with having inspired renewed interest in the idea of intentionality, especially in his lectures and in his 1874 book Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint. In this work Brentano is, among other things, concerned to identify the proper sphere or subject matter of psychology. Influenced in various ways by Aristotle’s psychology, by the medieval notion of the intentio of a thought, and by modern philosophical views such as those of Descartes and the empiricists, he identifies intentionality as the mark or distinctive characteristic of the mental. For Brentano this means that every mental phenomenon involves the “intentional inexistence” of an object toward which the mental phenomenon is directed. While every such mental phenomenon has an object, different mental phenomena relate to their objects in different ways depending on whether they are mental acts of presenting something, of judging about something, or of evaluating something as good or bad. Identifying intentionality as the mark of the mental in this way opens up the possibility of studying the mind in terms of its relatedness to objects, the different modes or forms that this relatedness takes (perceiving, imagining, hallucinating, and so forth), and in terms of the relationships that these different modes of intentionality bear to one another (the relationships between presentations, judgments, and evaluations; for example, that every judgment fundamentally depends on a presentation the object of which it is a judgment about). Husserl studied with Brentano from 1884 to 1886 and, along with others such as Alexius Meinong, Kasimir Twardowski, and Carl Stumpf, took away from this experience an abiding interest in the analysis of the intentionality of mind as a key to the clarification of other issues in philosophy.

It is important to note the distinction between intentionality in the sense under discussion here on the one hand and the idea of an intention in the sense of an intelligent agent’s goal or purpose in taking a specific action on the other. The intentionality under consideration here includes the idea of agent’s intentions to do things, but is also much broader, applying to any sort of object-directed thought or experience whatsoever. Thus, while it would be normal to say that “Jack intended to score a point when he kicked the ball toward the goal”, in the sense of ‘intention’ pertinent to Husserl it is equally correct to say that “Jack intended the bird as a blue jay”. This latter being a way of saying that Jack directed his mind toward the bird by thinking of it or perceiving it as a blue jay.

Husserl himself analyzes intentionality in terms of three central ideas: intentional act, intentional object, and intentional content. It is arguably in Husserl’s Logical Investigations that these ideas receive their first systematic treatment as distinct but correlative elements in the structure of thought and experience. This section clarifies these three notions based on Husserl’s main commitments, though not always using his exact terminology.

The intentional act or psychological mode of a thought is the particular kind of mental event that it is, whether this be perceiving, believing, evaluating, remembering, or something else. The intentional act can be distinguished from its object, which is the topic, thing, or state of affairs that the act is about. So the intentional state of seeing a white dog can be analyzed in terms of its intentional act, visually perceiving, and in terms of its intentional object, a white dog. Intentional act and intentional object are distinct since it is possible for the same kind of intentional act to be directed at different objects (perceiving a tree vs. perceiving a pond vs. perceiving a house) and for different intentional acts to be directed at the same object (merely thinking about the Eiffel Tower vs. perceiving the Eiffel Tower vs. remembering the Eiffel Tower). At the same time the two notions are correlative. For any intentional mental event it would make no sense to speak of it as involving an act without an intentional object any more than it would to say that the event involved an intentional object but no act or way of attending to that object (no intentional act). The notion of intentionality as a correlation between subject and object is a prominent theme in Husserl’s Phenomenology.

a. Intentional Content

The third element of the structure of intentionality identified by Husserl is the intentional content. It is a matter of some controversy to what extent and in what way intentional content is truly distinct from the intentional object in Husserl’s writings. The basic idea, however, can be stated without too much difficulty.

The intentional content of an intentional event is the way in which the subject thinks about or presents to herself the intentional object. The idea here is that a subject does not just think about an intentional object simpliciter; rather the subject always thinks of the object or experiences it from a certain perspective and as being a certain way or as being a certain kind of thing. Thus one does not just perceive the moon, one perceives it “as bright”, “as half full” or “as particularly close to the horizon”. For that matter, one perceives it “as the moon” rather than as some other heavenly body. Intentional content can be thought of along the lines of a description or set of information that the subject takes to characterize or be applicable to the intentional objects of her thought. Thus, in thinking that there is a red apple in the kitchen the subject entertains a certain presentation of her kitchen and of the apple that she takes to be in it and it is in virtue of this that she succeeds in directing her thought towards these things rather than something else or nothing at all. It is important to note, however, that for Husserl intentional content is not essentially linguistic. While intentional content always involves presenting an object in one way rather than another, Husserl maintained that the most basic kinds of intentionality, including perceptual intentionality, are not essentially linguistic. Indeed, for Husserl, meaningful use of language is itself to be analyzed in terms of more fundamental underlying intentional states (this can be seen, for example, throughout LI, I). For this reason characterizations of intentional content in terms of “descriptive content” have their limits in the context of Husserl’s thought.

The distinction between intentional object and intentional content can be clarified based on consideration of puzzles from the philosophy of language, such as the puzzle of informative identity statements. It is quite trivial to be told that Mark Twain is Mark Twain. However, for some people it can be informative and cognitively significant to learn that Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens. The notion of intentional content can be used to explain this. When a subject thinks about the identity statement asserting that Mark Twain is Mark Twain, the subject thinks about Mark Twain in the same way (using the same intentional content; perhaps “the author of Huckleberry Finn”) in association with the name on both the left and right sides of the identity, whereas when a subject thinks about the identity statement asserting that Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens what he learns is that different intentional contents (those associated with the names ‘Mark Twain’ and ‘Samuel Clemens’ respectively) are true of the same intentional object. Cases such as this both motivate the distinction between intentional content and intentional object and can be explained in terms of it.

The notion of intentional content as distinct from intentional object is also important in relation to the issue of thought about and reference to non-existent objects. Examples of this include perceptual illusions, thought about fictional objects such as Hamlet or Lilliput, thought about impossible objects such as round-squares, and thought about scientific kinds that turn out not to exist such as phlogiston. What is common to each of these cases is that it seems possible to have meaningful experiences, thoughts and beliefs about these things even though the corresponding objects do not exist, at least not in any ordinary sense of ‘exist’. Identifying intentional content as a distinct and meaningful element of the structure of intentionality makes it possible for Husserl to explain such cases of meaningful thought about the non-existent in a way similar to that of Gottlob Frege and different from the strategy of his fellow student of Brentano, Alexius Meinong. Approaching issues of intentionality from the perspective of logic and the philosophy of language, Frege handled such cases by drawing a distinction between the sense or meaning and the referent (object denoted) of a term, and then saying that non-referring terms such as ‘Ulysses’ have senses, but no referents (Frege 1948). Meinong, on the other hand, was driven by his commitment to the thesis of intentionality to posit a special category of objects, the non-existing objects or objects that have Nichtsein, as the intentional objects of such thoughts (Meinong 1960). For Husserl, such cases involve an intentional act and intentional content where the intentional content does present an intentional object, but there is no real object at all corresponding to the intentional appearance. Given this, one way of reading the distinction between intentional content and intentional object is as a generalization to all mental acts of Frege’s primarily linguistic distinction between the senses and the referents of terms and sentences (for a defense of this interpretation see Føllesdal 1982, while for discussion and resistance to the view, see Drummond 1998). Husserl’s exact understanding of the ontological situation regarding intentional objects is quite involved and undergoes some changes between Logical Investigations and his later phenomenology, beginning with Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. However, throughout his work Husserl is able to make use of the distinction between intentional content and intentional object to handle cases of meaningful thought about the non-existent without having to posit, in Meinongian fashion, special categories of non-existent objects.

The basic structure of Husserl’s account of intentionality thus involves three elements: intentional act, intentional content and intentional object. For Husserl, the systematic analysis of these elements of intentionality lies at the heart of the theory of consciousness, as well as, in varying ways, of logic, language and epistemology.

2. Logical Investigations

Logical Investigations (hereafter ‘Investigations’), which came out in two volumes in the years 1900 and 1901, represents Husserl’s first definitive treatment of intentionality and is the source of the main ideas that would drive much of his later philosophical thinking. The primary project of the Investigations is to criticize a view in the philosophy of logic called “psychologism” according to which the laws of logic are in some sense natural laws or rules governing the human mind and can thus be studied empirically by psychology. Husserl, notably in agreement with Frege, believed that this view had the undesirable consequences of treating the laws of logic as contingent rather than necessarily true and as being empirically discoverable rather than as known and validated a priori. In the first part of the Investigations, the “Prolegomena to Pure Logic”, Husserl systematically criticizes the psychologistic view and proposes to replace it with his own conception of “pure logic” as the a priori framework for organizing, understanding and validating the results of the formal, natural and social sciences (Husserl called the “theory of scientific theory in general” that pure logic was to be the foundation for ‘Wissenschaftslehre’). For Husserl, pure logic is an a priori system of necessary truths governing entailment and explanatory relationships among propositions that does not in any way depend on the existence of human minds for its truth or validity. However, Husserl maintains that the task of developing a human understanding of pure logic requires investigations into the nature of meaning and language, and into the way in which conscious intentional thought is able to comprehend meanings and come to know logical (and other) truths. Thus the bulk of a work that is intended to lay the foundations for a theory of logic as a priori, necessary, and completely independent of the composition or activities of the mind is devoted precisely to systematic investigations into the way in which language, meaning, thought, and knowledge are intentionally structured by the mind. While this tension is more apparent than real, it was a major source of criticism directed against the first edition of Logical Investigations, one which Husserl was concerned to clarify and defend himself against in his subsequent writings and in the second edition of the Investigations in 1913. Pertinent here is what Husserl had to say about language and expression (LI, I) and about intentionality itself (LI, V & VI).

a. Intentionality in Logical Investigations

In Logical Investigations Husserl developed a view according to which conscious acts are primarily intentional, and a mental act is intentional only in case it has an act-quality and an act-matter. Introducing this key distinction, Husserl writes:

The two assertions ‘2 x 2 = 4’ and ‘Ibsen is the principal founder of modern dramatic realism’, are both, qua assertions, of one kind; each is qualified as an assertion, and their common feature is their judgment-quality. The one, however, judges one content and the other another content. To distinguish such ‘contents’ from other notions of ‘content’ we shall speak here of the matter (material) of judgment. We shall draw similar distinctions between quality and matter in the case of all acts (LI, V § 20, p. 586).

An additional notion in the Investigations, which grows in importance in Husserl’s later work and will be discussed here, is the act-character. Husserl views act-quality, act-matter and act-character as mutually dependent constituents of a concrete particular thought. Just as there cannot be color without saturation, brightness and hue, so for Husserl there cannot be an intentional act without quality, matter and character. The quality of an act (called ‘intentional act’ above) is the kind of act that it is, whether perceiving, imagining, judging, wishing, and so fotrth. The matter of an act is what has been called above its intentional content, it is the mode or way in which an object is thought about, for example a house intended from one perspective rather than another, or Napoleon thought of first as “the victor at Jena”, then as “the vanquished at Waterloo”. The character of an act can be thought of as a contribution of the act-quality that is reflected in the act-matter. Act-character has to do with whether the content of the act, the act-matter, is posited as existing or as merely thought about and with whether the act-matter is taken as given with evidence (fulfillment) or without evidence (emptily intended). The next two sub-sections deal with act-character and act-matter respectively.

i. Act-Character

In the Investigations and in his later work, Husserl sometimes writes of an additional dimension in the analysis of intentionality, which he first calls the “act-character” and then in later writings the “doxic and ontic modalities” (For the former, see for example LI, VI § 7; for the latter, see Ideas, Chapter 4 particularly §§ 103—10). In the Investigations, act-character includes such things as whether the intentional act is merely one of reflecting on a possibility (a “non-positing act”) or one of judging or asserting that something is the case (a “positing act”), as well as the degree of evidence that is available to support the intention of the act as fulfilled or unfulfilled (as genuinely presenting some object in just the way that the act-matter suggests, or not). It seems clear that the character of an act is ultimately traceable to the act-quality, since it has to do with the way in which an act-matter is thought about rather than with what that act-matter itself presents. However, it is a contribution of the act-quality that casts a shadow or a halo around the matter, giving the content of the act a distinctive character. This becomes clearer through consideration of particular cases.

Consider first positing and non-positing acts. When a subject wonders whether or not the train will be on time, the content or act-matter of her intention is that of the train being on time. However, in this case the subject is not positing that the train will be on time, but merely reflecting on this in a non-committal (“non-positing”) way as a possibility. The same difference is present in the case of merely wondering whether Bob is the murderer on the one hand (non-positing act), and forming the firm judgment that he is on the other (positing act) (on positing and non-positing acts, see LI, V §§ 38—42).

The character of an intentional act also has to do with whether it is an “empty” merely signitive intention or whether it is a “non-empty” or fulfilled intention. Here what is at issue is the extent to which a subject has evidence of some sort for accepting the content of their intention. For example, a subject could contemplate, imagine or even believe that “the sun set today will be beautiful with few clouds and lots of orange and red colors” already at eleven in the morning. At this point the intention is an empty one because it merely contemplates a possible state of affairs for which there is no intuitive (experiential) evidence. When the same subject witnesses the sun set later in the day, her intention will either be fulfilled (if the sunset matches what she thought it would be like) or unfulfilled (if the sun set does not match her earlier intention). For Husserl, the difference here too does not have to do with the content or act-matter itself, but rather with the evidential character of the intention (LI VI, §§ 1—12).

Importantly, the distinctions between positing and non-positing acts on the one hand and between empty and fulfilled intentions on the other are separate. It would be possible for a subject to posit the existence of something for which she had no evidence or fulfillment (perhaps the belief that her favorite candidate will win next year’s election), just as it would be possible for a subject to not posit or affirm something for which she did have fulfillment or evidence (such as refraining from believing that water causes sticks immersed in it to bend, in spite of immediate perceptual information supporting this).

ii. Act-Matter

As noted above, the matter of an intentional act is its content: the way in which it presents the intentional object as being. The act-matter is:

that element in an act which first gives it reference to an object, and reference so wholly definite that it not merely fixes the object meant in a general way, but also the precise way in which it is meant. (LI, V § 20, p. 589, italics Husserl’s)

So the act-matter both determines to what object, if any, a thought refers, and determines how the thought presents that object as being. For Husserl, the matter of an intentional act does not consist of only linguistic descriptive content. The notion of act-matter is simply that of the significant object-directed mode of an act, and can be perceptual, imaginative, or memorial, linguistic or non-linguistic, particular and indexical, or general, context-neutral and universal. This makes intentionality and intentional content (act-matter) the fundamental targets of analysis, with the theory of language and expression to be analyzed in terms of these notions rather than the other way around. Husserl is thus committed to the notion that intentionality is primary and language secondary, and so also to the view that meaningful non-linguistic intentional thought and experience are both possible and common (LI, I §§ 9—11, 19, & 20).

Husserl’s understanding of the metaphysics of act-matter is also important. Motivated by his anti-psychologism he wants to treat meanings as objective and independent of the minds of particular subjects. Because of this Husserl views meanings in the Investigations as “ideal species”, a kind of abstract entity akin to a universal. However, having done this Husserl also needs to explain how it is that these abstract meanings can play a role in the intentional thought of actual subjects. Husserl’s solution to this is to say that meanings are ideal species or kinds of act-matter that are then instantiated in the actual act-matter of particular intentional subjects when they think the relevant thoughts. Thus, just as there is an ideal species or universal for shape, which gets instantiated in particular instances of shaped objects in the world, so there is an ideal species or universal of the act-matter “2+2=4”, which gets instantiated in the act-matter of a particular subject when he thinks this thought. Whereas Fregean accounts deal with the fact that one individual can have the same thought at different times and different individuals can think about the same thing at any time by positing a single abstract sense that is the numerically identical content of all of their thoughts, Husserl views particular act-matters or contents as instances of ideal act-matter species. Thus, on Husserl’s view, two subjects are able to think about the same thing in the same way when both of them instantiate exactly similar instances of a single kind of content or act-matter. Thus if John and Sarah are both thinking about how they would like to see the Twins win the 2008 World Series in baseball, they are having the same thought and thinking about the same objects in virtue of instantiating exactly similar act-matter instances of the single act-matter species “the Twins win the 2008 World series in baseball” (LI, I §§ 30—4, V §§ 21 & 45).

b. Intentionality, Meaning and Expression in Logical Investigations

Largely motivated by his concern with developing a pure logic, Husserl devotes the entire first Logical Investigation, “Meaning and Expression”, to an analysis of issues of language, linguistic meaning and linguistic reference. Husserl’s discussion here is systematic and wide ranging, covering many issues that are also of concern to Frege in his analysis of language and that have continued to spur discussion in the philosophy of language up to the present. These include the distinction between linguistic types and tokens, the distinction between words and sentences and the meanings that these express, the distinction between sentence meaning and speaker meaning, the meaning and reference of proper names and the function of indexicals and demonstratives. As noted above, Husserl takes the intentionality of thought to be fundamental and the meaning-expressing and reference fixing capabilities of language to be parasitic on more basic features of intentionality. Here the main features of Husserl’s intentionality-based view of language are discussed.

i. Meaning and Expression

Husserl is interested in analyzing the meaning and reference of language as part of his project of developing a pure logic. This leads him to focus primarily on declarative sentences from ordinary language, rather than on other kinds of potentially meaningful signs (such as the way in which smoke normally indicates or is a sign of fire) and gestures (such as the way in which a grimace might indicate or convey that someone feels pain or is uncomfortable). Husserl thus uses ‘expression’ to refer to declarative sentences in natural language and to parts thereof, such as names, general nouns, indexicals,and so forth (LI, I §§ 1—5).

Husserl maintains that the meaning of an expression cannot be identical to the expression for two reasons. First, expressions in different languages, such as ‘the cat is friendly’ and ‘il gatto è simpatico’ are linguistically different, but have the same meaning. Additionally, the same linguistic expression, such as ‘I am going to the bank’ can have different meanings on different occasions (due in this case to the ambiguity of the word ‘bank’). Thus sameness of word or linguistic expression is neither necessary nor sufficient for sameness of meaning (LI, I §§ 11 & 12).

Husserl also maintains that the meaning of a linguistic expression cannot be identical with its referent or referents. In support of this Husserl appeals to phenomena such as informative identity statements and meaningful linguistic expressions that have no referent, among others. An example of the first sort of case would be Frege’s famous ‘Hesperus is Phosphorus’, where ‘Hesperus’ means “the evening star” and ‘Phosphorus’ means “the morning star”. Both ‘Hesperus’ and ‘Phosphorus’ refer to the planet Venus and so if the meaning of a term just is the object that it refers to, then anyone who knows that Hesperus is Hesperus should also know that Hesperus is Phosphorus, yet clearly this is not the case. Husserl’s own explanation for this would be that a subject who found ‘Hesperus is Phosphorus’ informative would do so because he associated different act-matters or intentional contents with each of these names. Thus Husserl, like Frege, distinguishes the meaning of a term or expression both from that term itself and from the object or objects to which the term refers. Husserl identifies these distinctive linguistic meanings as kinds of intentional act-matter (LI, I §§ 13 & 14).

In the Investigations Husserl describes the normal use of an expression, such as ‘the weather is cool today’, in the following way. A subject who utters this expression to a companion is in an intentional state, which includes an act-matter or intentional content that presents the weather as being cool today. This act-matter instantiates an ideal species or act-matter type “the weather is cool today” and in virtue of doing so directs the utterer’s attention to the actual state of affairs regarding the weather. It is in virtue of these facts about the utterer’s intentional states that the words express, for him, the meaning that they do (which is not, of course, to rule out the possibility of miscommunication; for Husserl the description here is just the standard case). The subject performing the utterance does, in principle, three things for his interlocutor. First, the subject’s utterance “expresses” the ideal meaning “the weather is cool today”. Second, assuming the interlocutor grasps that this is what is being expressed, her attention will itself be directed to the referent of this ideal sense, namely the state of affairs involving the weather today (her act-matter will then also instantiate the relevant ideal act-matter species). Third, the subject will, in making his utterance, “intimate” to his interlocutor that he has certain beliefs or is undergoing certain mental states or experiences. This last point is very important for Husserl. He maintains that in normal cases what a subject intimates in uttering an expression (that he believes that the weather is cool today or that he fears that his country will intervene) is not part of the meaning of that expression, even though it is something that the interlocutor will be able to understand on the basis of the subject’s utterance. It is only in cases where a subject is making an assertion about his experiences, attitudes or mental states (such as ‘I doubt that things will improve this year’) that expressed meaning and intimated meaning coincide (on intimation, see LI, I §§ 7 & 8; the majority of the points summarized here are in the first chapter of LI, I, which is §§ 1—16).

ii. Essentially Occasional Expressions: Indexicals

Husserl recognized clearly the need for a distinction between what he called “objective” expressions on the one hand, and those that are “essentially occasional” on the other. An example of an objective expression would be a statement concerning logic, mathematics or the sciences whose meaning is fixed regardless of the context in which it is used (for example ‘The Pythagorean Theorem is a theorem of geometry’ or ‘7+5=12’). An example of an essentially occasional expression would be a sentence such as ‘I am hungry’, which seems to in some sense change its meaning on different occasions of utterance, depending on who is speaking. According to Husserl, essentially occasional expressions include both indexicals (‘I’, ‘you’, ‘here’, ‘now’, and so forth) and demonstratives (‘this’, ‘that’ , and so forth). Such expressions have two facets of meaning. The first is what Husserl calls a constant “semantic function” associated with particular indexical expressions. For example, “It is the universal semantic function of the word ‘I’ to designate whoever is speaking…” (LI, I §26, p. 315). Husserl recognizes, however, that the sentences expressing these semantic functions cannot simply be substituted for indexicals without affecting the meaning of sentences containing them. A subject who believes “whoever is now speaking is hungry” effectively has an existentially quantified belief to the effect that the person, whoever he or she is, who is now speaking is hungry. In order to capture what such a subject would mean when he says ‘I am hungry’ it is necessary to somehow make it clear that the individual quantified over is indeed the person now speaking, but there seems to be no way to do this other than to re-insert the indexical ‘I’ itself in the sentence. This makes it necessary to identify a second facet or component of indexical content.

To deal with this, Husserl proposes a distinction between the semantic function or “indicating meaning” of indexicals, which remains constant from use to use, and the “indicated” meaning of indexicals, which is fundamentally cued to certain features of the speaker and context of utterance. Thus the “indicating meaning” of ‘I’ is always “whoever is now speaking”, but the indicated meaning of its use on a given occasion is keyed to the “self-awareness” or “self-presentation” of the speaker on that occasion. In general, the indicating meaning of an indexical will specify some general relationship between the utterance of a sentence and some feature of the speaker’s conscious awareness or perceptually given environment, while the indicated meaning will be determined by what the speaker is actually aware of in the context in which the sentence is uttered. In the case of many indexicals, such as ‘you’ and ‘here’ their indicating meaning may be supplied in part by demonstrative pointing to features of the immediate perceptual environment. Thus, Husserl writes, “The meaning of ‘here’ is in part universal and conceptual [semantic function/indicating meaning], inasmuch as it always names a place as such, but to this universal element the direct place-presentation [indicated meaning] attaches, varying from case to case” (LI I § 26, pp. 317—18). Husserl thus has a relatively clear understanding of some of the key issues surrounding indexical thought and reference that have been recently discussed in the work of philosophers of language such as John Perry (1977, 1979), as well as an account of how indexical thought and reference works. The question of whether or not this account is adequate to resolve all of the issues raised by contemporary discussions of indexicals and demonstratives, however, is one that goes beyond the scope of this article (for discussion of this issue in Husserl’s philosophy see Smith and McIntyre 1982, pp. 194—226).

3. Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy: The Perceptual Noema

In the year 1913 Husserl published both a revised edition of Logical Investigations and the Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy (hereafter, Ideas). Between the first publication of the Investigations and the works of 1913 the main transition in Husserl’s thought is a change in emphasis from the primary project of laying the foundations of a pure a priori logic to the primary project of developing a systematic phenomenology of consciousness with the theory of intentionality at its core. In the Ideas, Husserl proposes the systematic description and analysis of first person consciousness, focusing on the intentionality of this consciousness, as the fundamental first step in both the theory of consciousness itself and, by extension, in all other areas of philosophy as well. With hints of the idea already present in the first edition of Logical Investigations, by 1913 Husserl has come to see first person consciousness as epistemologically and so logically prior to other forms of knowledge and inquiry. Whereas Descartes took his own conscious awareness to be epistemically basic and then immediately tried to infer, based on his knowledge of this awareness, the existence of a God, an external world, and other knowledge, Husserl takes first-person conscious awareness as epistemically basic and then proposes the systematic study of this consciousness itself as a fundamental philosophical task. In order to lay the foundations for this project Husserl proposes a methodology known as the phenomenological reduction.

The phenomenological reduction involves performing what Husserl calls the epoché, which is carried out by “bracketing”, setting in abeyance, or “neutralizing” the existential thesis of the “natural attitude”. The idea behind this is that most people most of the time do not focus their attention on the structure of their experience itself but rather look past this experience and focus their attention and interests on objects and events in the world, which they take to be unproblematically real or existent. This assumption about the unproblematic existence of the objects of experience is the “existential thesis” of the natural attitude. The purpose of the epoché is not to doubt or reject this thesis, but simply to set it aside or put it out of play so that the subject engaging in phenomenological investigation can reorient the focus of her attention to her experiences qua experiences and just as they are experienced. This amounts to a reorienting of the subject’s intentional focus from the natural to the phenomenological attitude. A subject who has performed the epoché and adopted the phenomenological attitude is in a position to objectively describe the features of her experience as she experiences them, the phenomena. Questions of the real existence of particular objects of experience and even of the world or universe themselves are thus set aside in order to make way for the systematic study of first person conscious experience (Ideas, §§ 27—32; Natanson 1973, chapters 2 & 3).

Distinct from the phenomenological reduction, but important for the project of Husserl’s Phenomenology as a whole, is what is sometimes called the “eidetic reduction”. The eidetic reduction involves not just describing the idiosyncratic features of how things appear to one, as might occur in introspective psychology, but focusing on the essential characteristics of the appearances and their structural relationships and correlations with one another. Husserl calls insights into essential features of kinds of things “eidetic intuitions”. Such eidetic intuitions, or intuitions into essence, are the result of a process Husserl calls ‘eidetic’ or ‘free’ variation in imagination. It involves focusing on a kind of object, such as a triangle, and systematically varying features of that object, reflecting at each step on whether the object being reflected upon remains, in spite of its altered feature(s), an instance of the kind under consideration. Each time the object does survive imaginative feature alteration that feature is revealed as inessential, while each feature the removal of which results in the object intuitively ceasing to instantiate the kind (such as addition of a fourth side to a triangle) is revealed as a necessary feature of that kind. Husserl maintained that this procedure can incrementally reveal elements of the essence of a kind of thing, the ideal case being one in which intuition of the full essence of a kind occurs. The eidetic reduction compliments the phenomenological reduction insofar as it is directed specifically at the task of analyzing essential features of conscious experience and intentionality. The considerations leading to the initial positing of the distinction between intentional act, intentional object and intentional content would, according to Husserl, be examples of this method at work and of some of its results in the domain of the mental. Whereas the purpose of the phenomenological reduction is to disclose and thematize first person consciousness so that it can be described and analyzed, the purpose of the eidetic reduction is to focus phenomenological investigations more precisely on the essential or invariant features of conscious intentional experience. (Ideas, §§ 34 & 69—71; Natanson 1973, chapter 4).

There is much debate about the exact significance, especially metaphysical and epistemological, of Husserl’s shift in focus and introduction of the methodology of the phenomenological reduction in the Ideas. Important here is that the notions of intentionality and intentional content remain central to Husserl’s project and so many of the descriptions and results of the Investigations remain relevant for the Ideas. However, Husserl does both modify and expand his views about intentionality, as well as the kinds of analyses of it that he pursues. Whereas in the Investigations Husserl was interested in intentionality specifically in relation to the project of laying the foundations for pure logic, in the Ideas he is interested in giving a systematic account of the ways in which intentionality structures, “constitutes”, and so makes possible all types of cognition, including the awareness of self, time, physical objects, mathematical objects, an intersubjective social world and many other things besides. The sections that follow concentrate on the core ideas concerning intentionality and intentional content from the Ideas, leaving many of these other areas out of consideration.

a. Noesis and Noema: Terminology and Ontology

One change between the Investigations and the Ideas is that Husserl began using the term ‘noesis’ to refer to intentional acts or “act-quality” and ‘noema’ (plural ‘noemata’) to refer to what, in the Investigations had been referred to as “act-matter”. Husserl does not simply change his terminology, however. This change in terminology coincides with an apparent change in metaphysical understanding of the relationship between the noema as an ideal meaning and the particular mental activities of actual subjects, and also with a much more intense interest in analyzing the different elements of the noema, as well as understanding its relationships, both temporal and semantic, to other noemata.

Metaphysically the main change is that Husserl seems to abandon the model of meanings as ideal species that get instantiated in the act-matters of particular subjects in favor of a more direct correlative relationship between the noesis (intentional acts) and the noemata (their objects). In Ideas it is noemata themselves that are the objects of intentional thought, that are graspable and repeatable and that, according to Husserl, are not parts of the intentional acts of conscious subjects. It is a point of interpretative and philosophical contention whether the noema, as Husserl understood it, is better viewed as a sort of abstract Fregean sense that mediates between the subjective noetic acts of individual thinkers and the objective referents of their thoughts (Føllesdal 1982, Smith and McIntyre 1982), or whether the noema is better seen as the object of intentional thought itself as viewed from a particular perspective (Drummond 1990). While the difference between these two interpretations may seem rather small, they are actually quite different in terms of their metaphysical commitments and in terms of the particular issues of meaning, reference, and epistemology that they are able to resolve or be challenged by. For a general introduction and overview see the introduction to (Smith and Smith 1995) and for more detailed discussion of some of the main differences see (Dreyfus and Hall 1982, Zahavi 1994, Drummond 2003). No attempt will be made to resolve this interpretative dispute here, though it is worth noting that the question of the metaphysical status of the noesis, the noema, and the intentional object (if indeed this is to be viewed as a distinct entity in Husserl’s ontology) is in part complicated by Husserl’s methodological procedure of bracketing questions of existence.

b. Structural Features of the Noema

In the Ideas Husserl identifies three central features of the noema, focusing especially on the case of perception. Husserl first distinguishes between a component of sense or descriptive content on the one hand (accounting for the mode of presentation or description under which the object is intended), and a core component standing for or presenting the very identity of the object intended, a sort of pure “X” as Husserl calls it, underlying the various contents or noemata that are correlated with a single object of thought. What Husserl is focusing on here is the idea that to be conscious of an object is not just to be conscious of something under one description or way of viewing it, but it is also to be conscious of the object as an identity of its own, one that is simultaneously given through discrete noematic perspectives or experiences, but is also more than what any one of these experiences presents it as being. When Husserl says that there is a noematic “core” or underlying “X” in the noema, what he means is that when we think of an object we always think of it as an entity with its own identity as well as an object as it appears to us or is thought of by us. Related to this point, Husserl maintains that the intention of an object via a certain noema at one moment involves, not only intending the object as it is currently experienced, but also contains a third element consisting of pointing references to a “horizon” of further possible determinations of the object, to further noemata or ways of being directed to one and the same object that are either motivated by or consistent with the way in which the current intention presents that object. The structure of the noema is thus quite complex, consisting of a noematic core, some descriptive or presentational content, and a horizon containing pointing references to other possible ways (noemata) of experiencing one and the same identical object (some of the most definitive sections on noesis and noema are Ideas, §§ 128—35, however the concepts are first introduced over two chapters from §§ 76—96).

Consider the perceptual experience of a red barn in a field in southeastern Wisconsin. The intentional content or noema of this experience will provide immediate awareness of one side or profile of the barn, perhaps intended as a barn, or perhaps just intended as a structure of some sort. This will be the descriptive sense or content of the intention. However, in this very perception the barn is not experienced as merely a facet or a two-dimensional stretch of color in space. Rather, it is experienced as a three dimensional object possessing other sides, parts and properties, and capable of being explored, investigated and determined, in short intended with regard to each of these further features. The barn, as an object of perception, transcends the information that can be given regarding it, the intention of it that can be made via any given noema, and this fact is a feature that is already intended in the very first thought a subject has about the barn. This is what is meant by the term ‘horizon’ or ‘noematic horizon’. From the first experience, the subject already has a sense of how to go about further determining, further intending and experiencing the object of thought, in this case, the barn. Perhaps the current experience is of the front side of the barn as being red; then this very experience includes as part of its “noematic horizon” the intention that the barn must also have a back side of some sort, and that this side of the barn, along with its color (perhaps it also is red, or perhaps grey, but at any rate it must have some color) can be experienced if the subject walks around to it and looks. In each further experience of the barn, in each further determination of it in thought, it is one and the same barn that is itself given, one and the same definite identity or object “X” that underlies all of the particular presentations of the same object, and that unites them in a “synthesis of identity” to provide a continuous and, ideally, unbroken series of further determinations of the same object, of further intentional experiences in which more is “filled in” or determined about the way the object actually is. Regarding such a system of experiences of the same object, Husserl says,

…There is inherent in each noema a pure object-something as a point of unity and, at the same time, we see how in a noematic respect two sorts of object-concepts are to be distinguished: this pure point of unity, this noematic “object simpliciter,” and the “object in the How of its determinations”—including undeterminednesses which for the time being “remain open” and, in this mode, are co-meant. (Ideas, § 131, p. 314)

Here, the “point of unity” is the underlying core of intended object identity “X”, the “object in the How of its determinations” is the descriptive content or sense, and the “undeterminednesses” constitute the horizon of the current content. Thus, it is possible to distinguish, phenomenologically speaking, between the way in which the object is intended via a particular noema or sense, and the seemingly transcendent self-identical object that is intended, and which is the ultimate determinant of the accuracy or inaccuracy, truth or falsity of the intentions that are directed toward it. While this distinction between the descriptive content and the identical X in a noema is phenomenologically real, this does not mean that these are “really separable” parts of the content in such a way that it would be possible to experience the one in the absence of the other. Indeed, Husserl explicitly denies this possibility.

c. Systems of Noemata and Explication

This conception of the noema, as divided into a descriptive sense and the pure X or identity of the object intended via the sense, leads Husserl to the view that, phenomenologically speaking, it is possible to view an object (the underlying X) as determining a system of possible senses (noemata) or intentions of it, each of which is both (a) about that very same object and (b) able to be consciously recognized as about the same determinable X as the others when they are experienced in a sequence. Thus, in the example of the barn already discussed, a subject might begin by looking at it from the front and focusing on its color. This would be the first noema intending the very object X, the barn perceptually before one, as red. The subject could then go on to have further perceptual intentions of the barn by walking around it. Each time the subject shifts her perspective on or reconceptualizes the object of her thought, she entertains a new content or noema, a new possible way in which the barn can be experienced as being. If the barn is indeed the way she conceptualizes and experiences it, then that thought, that possibility is fulfilled by her ongoing experience. At each step the subject integrates her current experience with the previous one, identifying the X at the core of the current experience with the X at the core of the previous ones, and is at the same time directed toward new possible ways of filling out her experience of the barn in the horizon of the noema (for example by walking around it some more, or by going inside); Husserl refers to this process as a “synthesis of identity”. During the course of this “explication” of the horizon of the noema, it is always possible that some future experience will reveal the ones that have come before to have been in some fundamental way incorrect. For example, if the subject upon walking around to the back side of the barn discovers that it is really not a barn at all, but only a cleverly positioned façade, the original system of intentional experiences she had regarding it will be frustrated and a new system of intentions will begin.

Nevertheless, the idea that a single numerically identical object can be conceived, phenomenologically speaking, as the correlate of systems of contents or noemata all experienceable as directed towards one and the same object X gives rise, for Husserl, to the idea of an object as, phenomenologically speaking, the correlate of a complete set of such experiences. As Husserl puts it, using ‘perfect givenness’ to suggest the ideally possible experience of having gone through all of the possible correct intentions with regard to a given object:

But perfect givenness is nevertheless predesignated as “Idea” (in the Kantian sense)—as a system which, in its eidetic type, is an absolutely determined system of endless processes of continuous appearings, or as a field of these processes, an a priori determined continuum of appearances with different, but determined, dimensions, and governed throughout by a fixed set of eidetic laws…This continuum is determined more precisely as infinite on all sides, consisting of appearances in all its phases of the same determinable X so ordered in its concatenations and so determined with respect to the essential contents that any of its lines yields, in its continuous course, a harmonious concatenation (which itself is to be designated as a unity of mobile appearances) in which the X, given always as one and the same, is more precisely and never “otherwise” continuously-harmoniously determined. (Ideas, § 143, p. 342)

Here, then, we have what amounts to an analysis of the object of an intention considered from a phenomenological perspective. To be an object, phenomenologically speaking, is to be the correlate of a complete maximally consistent system of noematic senses, all synthesizable as directed towards one and the same underlying substrate or object X. This idea itself is given rise to by the three crucial features of the structure of definite intentional content that have been discussed here: the descriptive sense, the core content “X”, and the horizon of possible future experiences of one and the same object

David W. Smith and Ronald McIntyre have further developed Husserl’s account of the horizon of a noema at some length, and propose a distinction between kinds of possible further determinations of the object of a given thought that are predelineated in the horizon of a given noema (1982, pp. 246—56). It is possible to distinguish between (i) possible determinations that are motivated by the current noema or intentional content, (ii) possible determinations that are consistent with but not motivated by the current noema, and (iii) possible determinations that are neither motivated by nor consistent with the current noema. If a subject is intending a given object perceived from a particular side as a barn, then the motivated further determinations in the horizon will include further experiences of that same object as a barn: walking around it will reveal more barn-like sides, going inside will reveal that it is or has been used for certain purposes, more closely examining the material the walls are made of will reveal that they are not papier-mâché, and so forth. Now, there will still be divergent motivated possibilities. For example, barns can be made of either wood, or aluminum, or some combination of these with stone or of some other materials entirely, and they can also have many different colors, designs and particular interior layouts. Nevertheless, what makes each of these possibilities motivated is the fact that it is consistent with the object intended being exactly the kind of thing that it is currently intended as.

By contrast, a possible determination that is consistent with but unmotivated by the current perception of a barn as a barn is that the subject walks around to the back and discovers that the barn is really just a wooden barn façade erected to stimulate tourism in the area. This possible further experience is not totally inconsistent with a current experience of something as a barn, though it is not a motivated possibility relative to such an experience either. Finally, an experience that is neither motivated by nor consistent with the intention of an object as a barn would be the discovery that the current object is merely a complicated video image, or that it is some kind of new and heretofore undiscovered life form that just happens to look exactly like a barn when it is resting. A discovery such as this is, arguably, not even present in the horizon of the original noema to begin with. Husserl referred to experiences where the previously intended identity of an experienced object is entirely cancelled by some current experience as cases where the object intended “explodes”, and where it is unclear that the subject was really thinking about the object actually before her at all even if she was succeeding in referring to it in some minimal sense of the term (Ideas, §§ 138 & 151).

d. Additional Considerations

Husserl’s understanding of the noema in the Ideas retains the explanatory features (in terms of theory of language and its ability to resolves puzzles about meaningful reference to the non-existent, informative identity statements, and so forth) of Logical Investigations account while also incorporating a more nuanced analysis of the structure of intentional content itself and a more holistic understanding of how the intentional content (noema) that a subject is thinking at a given moment is interconnected with other features of that subject’s actual and possible experience (the systems of noemata).

In the Investigations Husserl retains an understanding of the “act-character” of an intentional event as being its quality of positing or not positing the existence of its object and of being evidentially empty or fulfilled. Referring to these characters as “modalities” of belief (“doxic” modalities) and experience, Husserl recognizes both the already identified modalities pertaining to beliefs and also additional “ontic” modalities pertaining to whether a subject takes the content of their intention to be necessary or merely possible, valuable or worthless, beautiful or ugly. The key feature of these noematic characters or modalities is that they are characteristics of thought and experience that affect its overall meaning for the subject but that are not, strictly speaking, represented in the content of the intention (the noema) itself.

The notions of empty and fulfilled intentions in conjunction with Husserl’s understanding of the noematic horizon and of systems of possible interrelated object-experiences allow him to continue the epistemological investigations begun earlier in the Sixth Logical Investigation along two major lines.

The first is the idea that the mere unfulfilled intention of an object or state of affairs, by its nature, dictates certain conditions of fulfillment or conditions under which the thought merely entertained in the current intention would be given with full and complete evidence or intuition. For example, the emptily intended thought of a beautiful sunset with lots of red and gold today has as its primary fulfillment conditions the direct perceptual intuition of a sunset matching in all relevant ways the content that it currently intends emptily. Husserl maintains that intentional beliefs and thoughts involving many different kinds of objects (physical objects, other minds, mathematical objects or proofs, abstract objects, scientific theories) all have fulfillment conditions that dictate what kinds of experiences and thought processes are necessary to bring them to evidential groundedness. Already in Logical Investigations Husserl saw this task as an essential contribution that phenomenology could make to epistemology and the theory of evidence and he continues to carry it out in the final chapters of the Ideas and in his later works.

The second idea that comes into its own with Husserl’s Phenomenology and understanding of the structure of intentionality is the idea of “constitution analysis” (Ideas, §§ 149—53). Husserl’s basic idea here is that consciousness of each kind of object of thought and experience, and of each noetic mode of being aware of the objects of experience (perception, introspection, reflection, imagination, reasoning, and so forth) is the result of a complex interworking of other intentional acts. However, some ways of thinking and experiencing are more basic or fundamental, while others depend or are founded on these basic intentions in very specific ways. As a simple example, the act of judging that something is the case presupposes some other act in which the idea or possibility of this thing’s being the case has been made available. It would be impossible to judge that something is (or is not the case) without a prior act familiarizing one with its existence or possibility in the first place. Husserl views awareness of complex intentional objects as the result of those objects having been “constituted” out of or on the basis of a series of more basic intentional states (Husserl usually identifies the most basic intentional experiences with various aspects of perception and introspection). Thus, a full phenomenological analysis of the cognition of a given kind of complex object, mathematical cognition, for example, will involve an analysis of the different kinds of intentional experiences and operations that underlie and so constitute the complex intentionality in question.

Of particular importance for Husserl in this connection is the notion of “categorial intuition”. In categorial intuition a subject becomes conscious of an articulated state of affairs as the object of her intention. Categorial intuition involves, for example, not just passive awareness of a ship, or just paying attention to particular parts or features of the ship, but rather intending the articulated complex state of affairs that is “the ship’s having two smokestacks” or “the ship’s being about to enter port”. It is intentional awareness of such facts that forms the basis of categorial judgments, and the intentional contents of categorial acts can be understood along the lines of propositions, the relations among and analysis of which is the subject matter of logic. In the present context, what is important is that the intentionality involved in categorial intuition is a complex intentionality built up out of more basic kinds of intentions and intentional transformations, and thus another key example of a phenomena requiring constitution analysis (LI, §§ 40—58). To the extent that understanding the factors that go into forming a belief or intention is relevant to evaluating the epistemic status of that belief, constitution analysis functions together with the analysis of evidence and fulfillment conditions and so comprises a part of Phenomenology’s contribution to epistemology.

It must also be noted, however, that constitution analysis within Phenomenology has an interest entirely independent of the role it plays in epistemology. This interest is that of providing a comprehensive analysis of the essential kinds of intentionality and relationships among them that are involved in making possible different kinds of complex intentional thoughts and experiences. As mentioned already, such constitution analyses include analysis of the constitution of time-consciousness, the constitution of mathematical object awareness, the constitution of bodily awareness, the constitution (subjective and inter-subjective) of the social world, and so forth.

The foregoing considerations go beyond the scope of what would normally be considered a discussion of Husserl’s views specifically on intentionality and intentional content. Hopefully they serve, however, to provide some sense of the interconnection between Husserl’s views concerning intentionality and the other parts of his philosophy.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Husserl

The collected works of Husserl were published in 1950, in Husserliana: Edmund Husserl — Gesammelte Werke, The Hague/Dordrecht: Nijhoff/Kluwer. The following are works by Husserl listed in the chronological order of their German publications (the German publication date is in brackets).

[LI] Logical Investigations, trans. J. N. Findlay, London: Routledge [1900/01; 2nd, revised edition 1913], 1973.
- [Cited in the text as: LI, Investigation # (I, II, etc.) section # (§), and, where quotes are used, page #].
“Philosophy as Rigorous Science,” trans. in Q. Lauer (ed.), Phenomenology and the Crisis of Philosophy, New York: Harper [1910], 1965.
[Ideas] Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy — First Book: General Introduction to a Pure Phenomenology, trans. F. Kersten. The Hague: Nijhoff [1913], 1982.
- [Cited in the text as: Ideas, section # (§), and, where quotes are used, page #].
On the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1893-1917), trans. J. B. Brough, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1928], 1990.
Formal and Transcendental Logic, trans. D. Cairns. The Hague: Nijhoff [1929], 1969.
Cartesian Meditations, trans. D. Cairns, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1931], 1988.
The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Philosophy, trans. D. Carr. Evanston: Northwestern University Press [1936/54], 1970.
Experience and Judgement, trans. J. S. Churchill and K. Ameriks, London: Routledge [1939], 1973.

b. Secondary Sources

The following works are secondary sources pertinent to Husserl’s views on intentionality and the role that it plays in his phenomenology.

Brentano, Franz. Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, ed. and trans. by L. L. McAlister. London: Routledge, 1973.
- Brentano’s classic work on intentionality as the mark of the mental. A central influence on Husserl.
Dreyfus, Hubert L., and Harrison Hall. Husserl, Intentionality, and Cognitive Science. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1982.
- A classic anthology collecting essays on the relationship of Husserl’s philosophy to cognitive science. This text also includes a number of contributions concerning the correct interpretation of the noema.
Drummond, John. “The Structure of Intentionality.” In Welton ed. The New Husserl: A Critical Reader. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2003.
- A comprehensive overview of the main features of Husserl’s conception of intentionality.
Drummond, John. “From Intentionality to Intensionality and Back.” Etudes Phenomenologiques 27—28 (1998): 89—126.
- An analysis of Husserl’s views on intentionality that situates them in their historical context with other members of the Brentano School and attempts to shed some light on the motivations for different interpretations of the noema or intentional content.
Drummond, John. Husserlian Intentionality and Non-Foundational Realism. Dodrecht: Kluwer, 1990.
- A thorough discussion of Husserl’s views including a lengthy exposition and defense of the view that sees the intentional noema as an abstract aspect of the intentional object rather than as a distinct sense.
Føllesdal, Dagfinn. “Noema and Meaning in Husserl.” Phenomenology and Philosophical Research, 50 (1990): 263—271.
Føllesdal, Dagfinn. “Husserl’s Notion of Noema” in Dreyfus (ed.) 1982.
- Føllesdal’s articles are considered the classic statement of the “Fregean” interpretation of the noema.
Gottlob Frege. “On Sense and Reference.” In Translations from the Philosophical Writings of Gottlob Frege, P. Geach and M. Black (eds. and trans.), Oxford: Blackwell, third edition, 1980.
- The classic source for the distinction between sense and reference and its application to issues of language and, by extension, intentionality.
Gurwitsch, Aron. “Husserl’s Theory of the Intentionality of Consciousness.” In Dreyfus (ed.) 1982.
- A distinctive interpretation of the intentional object as consisting of systems of noemata.
Kern, Iso. “The Three Ways to the Transcendental Phenomenological Reduction.” Husserl: Expositions and Appraisals. Eds. Frederick Elliston and Peter McCormick. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1977.
- A discussion of the phenomenological reduction and of different motivations that lead Husserl to it.
Alexius Meinong. 1960, “On the Theory of Objects,” in Roderick Chisholm (ed.), Realism and the Background of Phenomenology, Glencoe, Ill.: Free Press, 76–117
- A detailed account of the different kinds of existent and non-existent objects that Meinong recognized as categories in his ontology, as well as some discussion of the relationship of these to the intentionality of mind.
Mohanty, Jitendranath & McKenna, William (eds). Husserl’s Phenomenology: A Textbook. Lanham: University Press of America, 1989.
- A collection of essays covering numerous aspects of Husserl’s thought, including his views on intentionality.
Mohanty, Jitendranath. Husserl and Frege. Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1982.
- A comparison of Husserl and Frege’s views, including their views on psychologism and on the distinction between sense and referent.
Natanson, Maurice Alexander. Edmund Husserl; Philosopher of Infinite Tasks. Evanston Ill.: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
- A very accessible introduction Husserl’s Phenomenology, including helpful discussion of the phenomenological reduction and the natural attitude in the early chapters.
Perry, John. “The Problem of the Essential Indexical.” Nous 13.1 (1979): 3—21.
Perry, John. “Frege on Demonstratives.” The Philosophical Review, 86.4 (1977): 474—97.
- Classic articles on the semantics of indexicals and demonstratives.
Pietersma, Henry. Phenomenological Epistemology. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
- A thorough discussion of the epistemological views of Husserl, Heidegger, and Merleau-Ponty.
Smith, Barry, and David Woodruff Smith. The Cambridge Companion to Husserl. Cambridge; New York: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- A collection of essays on various aspects of Husserl’s philosophy. The introduction includes a helpful discussion of divergent interpretations of the noema.
Smith, Barry. Austrian Philosophy: The Legacy of Franz Brentano. Chicago and LaSalle, Illinois: Open Court Press, 1994.
- Includes discussion of the background and broader context against which Husserl developed his views of intentionality, including the views Brentano, Meinong, Stumpf, Twardowski and others.
Smith, David Woodruff, and Ronald McIntyre. Husserl and Intentionality: A Study of Mind, Meaning, and Language. Synthese Library; V. 154. Dordrecht, Holland: D. Reidel Pub. Co., 1982.
- A very thorough study. The early parts of the text are a clear introduction to Husserl on language and intentionality, while the rest defends a version of the “Fregean” interpreation of the noema and develops a possible worlds understanding of intentionality based on this.
Sokolowski, Robert (ed.). Edmund Husserl and the Phenomenological Tradition. Washington: Catholic University of America Press, 1988.
- Essays on various aspects of Husserl’s philosophy, including intentionality.
Zahavi, Dan, ed. Internalism and Externalism in Phenomenological Perspective. Special Issue: Synthese, 160. 2008.
- A special issue containing essays by six philosophers addressing various aspects of the relationship between Husserl’s Phenomenology and contemporary discussions of semantic internalism and externalism.
Gallagher, Shaun, and Zahavi, Dan. The Phenomenological Mind: an Introduction to Phenomenology and Cognitive Science. London: Routledge, 2008.
- An introduction to Phenomenology and intentionality, including intersections of these ideas with contemporary cognitive science.
Zahavi, Dan. “Husserl’s Noema and the Internalism-Externalism Debate.” Inquiry 47 (2004): 42-66.
- A discussion of the relationship between Husserl’s Phenomenology and the semantic internalism-externalism debate, the article also includes discussion of the main differences between competing interpretations of the noema within Husserl scholarship.
Zahavi, Dan. Husserl’s Phenomenology. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003.
- A comprehensive discussion of Husserl’s Phenomenology, including issues of intentionality and intentional content.

Author Information

Andrew D. Spear
Email: speara@gvsu.edu
Grand Valley State University
U. S. A.

American Enlightenment Thought

Although there is no consensus about the exact span of time that corresponds to the American Enlightenment, it is safe to say that it occurred during the eighteenth century among thinkers in British North America and the early United States and was inspired by the ideas of the British and French Enlightenments. Based on the metaphor of bringing light to the Dark Age, the Age of the Enlightenment (Siècle des lumières in French and Aufklärung in German) shifted allegiances away from absolute authority, whether religious or political, to more skeptical and optimistic attitudes about human nature, religion and politics. In the American context, thinkers such as Thomas Paine, James Madison, Thomas Jefferson, John Adams and Benjamin Franklin invented and adopted revolutionary ideas about scientific rationality, religious toleration and experimental political organization—ideas that would have far-reaching effects on the development of the fledgling nation. Some coupled science and religion in the notion of deism; others asserted the natural rights of man in the anti-authoritarian doctrine of liberalism; and still others touted the importance of cultivating virtue, enlightened leadership and community in early forms of republican thinking. At least six ideas came to punctuate American Enlightenment thinking: deism, liberalism, republicanism, conservatism, toleration and scientific progress. Many of these were shared with European Enlightenment thinkers, but in some instances took a uniquely American form.

Enlightenment Age Thinking
Six Key Ideas
Four American Enlightenment Thinkers
1. Franklin
2. Jefferson
3. Madison
4. Adams
Contemporary Work
References and Further Reading

1. Enlightenment Age Thinking

The pre- and post-revolutionary era in American history generated propitious conditions for Enlightenment thought to thrive on an order comparable to that witnessed in the European Enlightenments. In the pre-revolutionary years, Americans reacted to the misrule of King George III, the unfairness of Parliament (“taxation without representation”) and exploitative treatment at the hands of a colonial power: the English Empire. The Englishman-cum-revolutionary Thomas Paine wrote the famous pamphlet The Rights of Man, decrying the abuses of the North American colonies by their English masters. In the post-revolutionary years, a whole generation of American thinkers would found a new system of government on liberal and republican principles, articulating their enduring ideas in documents such as the Declaration of Independence, the Federalist Papers and the United States Constitution.

Although distinctive features arose in the eighteenth-century American context, much of the American Enlightenment was continuous with parallel experiences in British and French society. Four themes recur in both European and American Enlightenment texts: modernization, skepticism, reason and liberty. Modernization means that beliefs and institutions based on absolute moral, religious and political authority (such as the divine right of kings and the Ancien Régime) will become increasingly eclipsed by those based on science, rationality and religious pluralism. Many Enlightenment thinkers—especially the French philosophes, such as Voltaire, Rousseau and Diderot—subscribed to some form of skepticism, doubting appeals to miraculous, transcendent and supernatural forces that potentially limit the scope of individual choice and reason. Reason that is universally shared and definitive of the human nature also became a dominant theme in Enlightenment thinkers’ writings, particularly Immanuel Kant’s “What is Enlightenment?” and his Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals. The fourth theme, liberty and rights assumed a central place in theories of political association, specifically as limits state authority originating prior to the advent of states (that is, in a state of nature) and manifesting in social contracts, especially in John Locke’s Second Treatise on Civil Government and Thomas Jefferson’s drafts of the Declaration of Independence.

a. Moderate and Radical

Besides identifying dominant themes running throughout the Enlightenment period, some historians, such as Henry May and Jonathan Israel, understand Enlightenment thought as divisible into two broad categories, each reflecting the content and intensity of ideas prevalent at the time. The moderate Enlightenment signifies commitments to economic liberalism, religious toleration and constitutional politics. In contrast to its moderate incarnation, the radical Enlightenment conceives enlightened thought through the prism of revolutionary rhetoric and classical Republicanism. Some commentators argue that the British Enlightenment (especially figures such as James Hutton, Adam Ferguson and Adam Smith) was essentially moderate, while the French (represented by Denis Diderot, Claude Adrien Helvétius and François Marie Arouet) was decidedly more radical. Influenced as it was by the British and French, American Enlightenment thought integrates both moderate and radical elements.

b. Chronology

American Enlightenment thought can also be appreciated chronologically, or in terms of three temporal stages in the development of Enlightenment Age thinking. The early stage stretches from the time of the Glorious Revolution of 1688 to 1750, when members of Europe’s middle class began to break free from the monarchical and aristocratic regimes—whether through scientific discovery, social and political change or emigration outside of Europe, including America. The middle stage extends from 1751 to just a few years after the start of the American Revolution in 1779. It is characterized by an exploding fascination with science, religious revivalism and experimental forms of government, especially in the United States. The late stage begins in 1780 and ends with the rise of Napoléon Bonaparte, as the French Revolution comes to a close in 1815—a period in which the European Enlightenment was in decline, while the American Enlightenment reclaimed and institutionalized many of its seminal ideas. However, American Enlightenment thinkers were not always of a single mind with their European counterparts. For instance, several American Enlightenment thinkers—particularly James Madison and John Adams, though not Benjamin Franklin—judged the French philosophes to be morally degenerate intellectuals of the era.

c. Democracy and the Social Contract

Many European and American Enlightenment figures were critical of democracy. Skepticism about the value of democratic institutions was likely a legacy of Plato’s belief that democracy led to tyranny and Aristotle’s view that democracy was the best of the worst forms of government. John Adams and James Madison perpetuated the elitist and anti-democratic idea that to invest too much political power in the hands of uneducated and property-less people was to put society at constant risk of social and political upheaval. Although several of America’s Enlightenment thinkers condemned democracy, others were more receptive to the idea of popular rule as expressed in European social contract theories. Thomas Jefferson was strongly influenced by John Locke’s social contract theory, while Thomas Paine found inspiration in Jean-Jacques Rousseau’s. In the Two Treatises on Government (1689 and 1690), Locke argued against the divine right of kings and in favor of government grounded on the consent of the governed; so long as people would have agreed to hand over some of their liberties enjoyed in a pre-political society or state of nature in exchange for the protection of basic rights to life, liberty and property. However, if the state reneged on the social contract by failing to protect those natural rights, then the people had a right to revolt and form a new government. Perhaps more of a democrat than Locke, Rousseau insisted in The Social Contract (1762) that citizens have a right of self-government, choosing the rules by which they live and the judges who shall enforce those rules. If the relationship between the will of the state and the will of the people (the “general will”) is to be democratic, it should be mediated by as few institutions as possible.

2. Six Key Ideas

At least six ideas came to punctuate American Enlightenment thinking: deism, liberalism, republicanism, conservatism, toleration and scientific progress. Many of these were shared with European Enlightenment thinkers, but in some instances took a uniquely American form.

a. Deism

European Enlightenment thinkers conceived tradition, custom and prejudice (Vorurteil) as barriers to gaining true knowledge of the universal laws of nature. The solution was deism or understanding God’s existence as divorced from holy books, divine providence, revealed religion, prophecy and miracles; instead basing religious belief on reason and observation of the natural world. Deists appreciated God as a reasonable Deity. A reasonable God endowed humans with rationality in order that they might discover the moral instructions of the universe in the natural law. God created the universal laws that govern nature, and afterwards humans realize God’s will through sound judgment and wise action. Deists were typically (though not always) Protestants, sharing a disdain for the religious dogmatism and blind obedience to tradition exemplified by the Catholic Church. Rather than fight members of the Catholic faith with violence and intolerance, most deists resorted to the use of tamer weapons such as humor and mockery.

Both moderate and radical American Enlightenment thinkers, such as James Madison, Benjamin Franklin, Alexander Hamilton, John Adams and George Washington, were deists. Some struggled with the tensions between Calvinist orthodoxy and deist beliefs, while other subscribed to the populist version of deism advanced by Thomas Paine in The Age of Reason. Franklin was remembered for stating in the Constitutional Convention that “the longer I live, the more convincing proof I see of this truth—that God governs in the affairs of men.” In what would become known as the Jefferson Bible (originally The Life and Morals of Jesus of Nazareth), Jefferson chronicles the life and times of Jesus Christ from a deist perspective, eliminating all mention of miracles or divine intervention. God for deists such as Jefferson never loomed large in humans’ day-to-day life beyond offering a moral or humanistic outlook and the resource of reason to discover the content of God’s laws. Despite the near absence of God in human life, American deists did not deny His existence, largely because the majority of the populace still remained strongly religious, traditionally pious and supportive of the good works (for example monasteries, religious schools and community service) that the clergy did.

b. Liberalism

Another idea central to American Enlightenment thinking is liberalism, that is, the notion that humans have natural rights and that government authority is not absolute, but based on the will and consent of the governed. Rather than a radical or revolutionary doctrine, liberalism was rooted in the commercial harmony and tolerant Protestantism embraced by merchants in Northern Europe, particularly Holland and England. Liberals favored the interests of the middle class over those of the high-born aristocracy, an outlook of tolerant pluralism that did not discriminate between consumers or citizens based on their race or creed, a legal system devoted to the protection of private property rights, and an ethos of strong individualism over the passive collectivism associated with feudal arrangements. Liberals also preferred rational argumentation and free exchange of ideas to the uncritical of religious doctrine or governmental mandates. In this way, liberal thinking was anti-authoritarian. Although later liberalism became associated with grassroots democracy and a sharp separation of the public and private domains, early liberalism favored a parliamentarian form of government that protected liberty of expression and movement, the right to petition the government, separation of church and state and the confluence of public and private interests in philanthropic and entrepreneurial endeavors.

The claim that private individuals have fundamental God-given rights, such as to property, life, liberty and to pursue their conception of good, begins with the English philosopher John Locke, but also finds expression in Thomas Jefferson’s drafting of the Declaration of Independence. The U.S. Bill of Rights, the first ten amendments to the Constitution, guarantees a schedule of individual rights based on the liberal ideal. During the constitutional convention, James Madison responded to the anti-Federalists’ demand for a bill of rights as a condition of ratification by reviewing over two-hundred proposals and distilling them into an initial list of twelve suggested amendments to the Constitution, covering the rights of free speech, religious liberty, right to bear arms and habeas corpus, among others. While ten of those suggested were ratified in 1791, one missing amendment (stopping laws created by Congress to increase its members’ salaries from taking effect until the next legislative term) would have to wait until 1992 to be ratified as the Twenty-seventh Amendment. Madison’s concern that the Bill of Rights should apply not only to the federal government would eventually be accommodated with the passage of the Fourteenth Amendment (especially its due process clause) in 1868 and a series of Supreme Court cases throughout the twentieth-century interpreting each of the ten amendments as “incorporated” and thus protecting citizens against state governments as well.

c. Republicanism

Classical republicanism is a commitment to the notion that a nation ought to be ruled as a republic, in which selection of the state’s highest public official is determined by a general election, rather than through a claim to hereditary right. Republican values include civic patriotism, virtuous citizenship and property-based personality. Developed during late antiquity and early renaissance, classic republicanism differed from early liberalism insofar as rights were not thought to be granted by God in a pre-social state of nature, but were the products of living in political society. On the classical republican view of liberty, citizens exercise freedom within the context of existing social relations, historical associations and traditional communities, not as autonomous individuals set apart from their social and political ties. In this way, liberty for the classical republican is positively defined by the political society instead of negatively defined in terms of the pre-social individual’s natural rights.

While prefigured by the European Enlightenment, the American Enlightenment also promoted the idea that a nation should be governed as a republic, whereby the state’s head is popularly elected, not appointed through a hereditary blood-line. As North American colonists became increasingly convinced that British rule was corrupt and inimical to republican values, they joined militias and eventually formed the American Continental Army under George Washington’s command. The Jeffersonian ideal of the yeoman farmer, which had its roots in the similar Roman ideal, represented the eighteenth-century American as both a hard-working agrarian and as a citizen-soldier devoted to the republic. When elected to the highest office of the land, George Washington famously demurred when offered a royal title, preferring instead the more republican title of President. Though scholarly debate persists over the relative importance of liberalism and republicanism during the American Revolution and Founding (see Recent Work section), the view that republican ideas were a formative influence on American Enlightenment thinking has gained widespread acceptance.

d. Conservatism

Though the Enlightenment is more often associated with liberalism and republicanism, an undeniable strain of conservatism emerged in the last stage of the Enlightenment, mainly as a reaction to the excesses of the French Revolution. In 1790 Edmund Burkeanticipated the dissipation of order and decency in French society following the revolution (often referred to as “the Terror”) in his Reflections on the Revolution in France. Though it is argued that Burkean conservatism was a reaction to the Enlightenment (or anti-Enlightenment), conservatives were also operating within the framework of Enlightenment ideas. Some Enlightenment claims about human nature are turned back upon themselves and shown to break down when applied more generally to human culture. For instance, Enlightenment faith in universal declarations of human rights do more harm than good when they contravene the conventions and traditions of specific nations, regions and localities. Similar to the classical republicans, Burke believed that human personality was the product of living in a political society, not a set of natural rights that predetermined our social and political relations. Conservatives attacked the notion of a social contract (prominent in the work of Hobbes, Locke and Rousseau) as a mythical construction that overlooked the plurality of groups and perspectives in society, a fact which made brokering compromises inevitable and universal consent impossible. Burke only insisted on a tempered version, not a wholesale rejection of Enlightenment values.

Conservatism featured strongly in American Enlightenment thinking. While Burke was critical of the French Revolution, he supported the American Revolution for disposing of English colonial misrule while creatively readapting British traditions and institutions to the American temperament. American Enlightenment thinkers such as James Madison and John Adams held views that echoed and in some cases anticipated Burkean conservatism, leading them to criticize the rise of revolutionary France and the popular pro-French Jacobin clubs during and after the French Revolution. In the forty-ninth Federalist Paper, James Madison deployed a conservative argument against frequent appeals to democratic publics on constitutional questions because they threatened to undermine political stability and substitute popular passion for the “enlightened reason” of elected representatives. Madison’s conservative view was opposed to Jefferson’s liberal view that a constitutional convention should be convened every twenty years, for “[t]he earth belongs to the living generation,” and so each new generation should be empowered to reconsider its constitutional norms.

e. Toleration

Toleration or tolerant pluralism was also a major theme in American Enlightenment thought. Tolerance of difference developed in parallel with the early liberalism prevalent among Northern Europe’s merchant class. It reflected their belief that hatred or fear of other races and creeds interfered with economic trade, extinguished freedom of thought and expression, eroded the basis for friendship among nations and led to persecution and war. Tiring of religious wars (particularly as the 16^th century French wars of religion and the 17^th century Thirty Years War), European Enlightenment thinkers imagined an age in which enlightened reason not religious dogmatism governed relations between diverse peoples with loyalties to different faiths. The Protestant Reformation and the Treaty of Westphalia significantly weakened the Catholic Papacy, empowered secular political institutions and provided the conditions for independent nation-states to flourish.

American thinkers inherited this principle of tolerant pluralism from their European Enlightenment forebearers. Inspired by the Scottish Enlightenment thinkers John Knox and George Buchanan, American Calvinists created open, friendly and tolerant institutions such as the secular public school and democratically organized religion (which became the Presbyterian Church). Many American Enlightenment thinkers, including Benjamin Franklin, Thomas Jefferson and James Madison, read and agreed with John Locke’s A Letter Concerning Toleration. In it, Locke argued that government is ill-equipped to judge the rightness or wrongness of opposing religious doctrines, faith could not be coerced and if attempted the result would be greater religious and political discord. So, civil government ought to protect liberty of conscience, the right to worship as one chooses (or not to worship at all) and refrain from establishing an official state-sanctioned church. For America’s founders, the fledgling nation was to be a land where persons of every faith or no faith could settle and thrive peacefully and cooperatively without fear of persecution by government or fellow citizens. Ben Franklin’s belief that religion was an aid to cultivating virtue led him to donate funds to every church in Philadelphia. Defending freedom of conscience, James Madison would write that “[c]onscience is the most sacred of all property.” In 1777, Thomas Jefferson drafted a religious liberty bill for Virginia to disestablish the government-sponsored Anglican Church—often referred to as “the precursor to the Religion Clauses of the First Amendment”—which eventually passed with James Madison’s help.

f. Scientific Progress

The Enlightenment enthusiasm for scientific discovery was directly related to the growth of deism and skepticism about received religious doctrine. Deists engaged in scientific inquiry not only to satisfy their intellectual curiosity, but to respond to a divine calling to expose God’s natural laws. Advances in scientific knowledge—whether the rejection of the geocentric model of the universe because of Copernicus, Kepler and Galileo’s work or the discovery of natural laws such as Newton’s mathematical explanation of gravity—removed the need for a constantly intervening God. With the release of Sir Isaac Newton’s Principia in 1660, faith in scientific progress took institutional form in the Royal Society of England, the Académie des Sciences in France and later the Academy of Sciences in Germany. In pre-revolutionary America, scientists or natural philosophers belonged to the Royal Society until 1768, when Benjamin Franklin helped create and then served as the first president of the American Philosophical Society. Franklin became one of the most famous American scientists during the Enlightenment period because of his many practical inventions and his theoretical work on the properties of electricity.

3. Four American Enlightenment Thinkers

What follows are brief accounts of how four significant thinkers contributed to the eighteenth-century American Enlightenment: Benjamin Franklin, Thomas Jefferson, James Madison and John Adams.

a. Franklin

Benjamin Franklin, the author, printer, scientist and statesman who led America through a tumultuous period of colonial politics, a revolutionary war and its momentous, though no less precarious, founding as a nation. In his Autobiography, he extolled the virtues of thrift, industry and money-making (or acquisitiveness). For Franklin, the self-interested pursuit of material wealth is only virtuous when it coincides with the promotion of the public good through philanthropy and voluntarism—what is often called “enlightened self-interest.” He believed that reason, free trade and a cosmopolitan spirit serve as faithful guides for nation-states to cultivate peaceful relations. Within nation-states, Franklin thought that “independent entrepreneurs make good citizens” because they pursue “attainable goals” and are “capable of living a useful and dignified life.” In his autobiography, Franklin claims that the way to “moral perfection” is to cultivate thirteen virtues (temperance, silence, order, resolution, frugality, industry, sincerity, justice, moderation, cleanliness, tranquility, chastity, and humility) as well as a healthy dose of “cheerful prudence.” Franklin favored voluntary associations over governmental institutions as mechanisms to channel citizens’ extreme individualism and isolated pursuit of private ends into productive social outlets. Not only did Franklin advise his fellow citizens to create and join these associations, but he also founded and participated in many himself. Franklin was a staunch defender of federalism, a critic of narrow parochialism, a visionary leader in world politics and a strong advocate of religious liberty.

b. Jefferson

A Virginian statesman, scientist and diplomat, Jefferson is probably best known for drafting the Declaration of Independence. Agreeing with Benjamin Franklin, he substituted “pursuit of happiness” for “property” in Locke’s schedule of natural rights, so that liberty to pursue the widest possible human ends would be accommodated. Jefferson also exercised immense influence over the creation of the United States’ Constitution through his extended correspondence with James Madison during the 1787 Constitutional Convention (since Jefferson was absent, serving as a diplomat in Paris). Just as Jefferson saw the Declaration as a test of the colonists’ will to revolt and separate from Britain, he also saw the Convention in Philadelphia, almost eleven years later, as a grand experiment in creating a new constitutional order. Panel four of the Jefferson Memorial records how Thomas Jefferson viewed constitutions: “I am not an advocate for frequent changes in laws and constitutions, but laws and institutions must go hand in hand with the progress of the human mind. As that becomes more developed, more enlightened, as new discoveries are made, new truths discovered and manners and opinions change, with the change of circumstances, institutions must advance also to keep pace with the times.” Jefferson’s words capture the spirit of organic constitutionalism, the idea that constitutions are living documents that transform over time in pace with popular thought, imagination and opinion.

c. Madison

Heralded as the “Father of the Constitution,” James Madison was, besides one of the most influential architects of the U.S. Constitution, a man of letters, a politician, a scientist and a diplomat who left an enduring legacy on American philosophical thought. As a tireless advocate for the ratification of the Constitution, Madison advanced his most groundbreaking ideas in his jointly authoring The Federalist Papers with John Jay and Alexander Hamilton. Indeed, two of his most enduring ideas—the large republic thesis and the argument for separation-of-powers and checks-and-balances—are contained there. In the tenth Federalist paper, Madison explains the problem of factions, namely, that the development of groups with shared interests (advocates or interest groups) is inevitable and dangerous to republican government. If we try to vanquish factions, then we will in turn destroy the liberty upon which their existence and activities are founded. Baron d’ Montesquieu, the seventeenth-century French philosopher, believed that the only way to have a functioning republic, one that was sufficiently democratic, was for it to be small, both in population and land mass (on the order of Ancient Athens or Sparta). He then argues that a large and diverse republic will stop the formation of a majority faction; if small groups cannot communicate over long distances and coordinate effectively, the threat will be negated and liberty will be preserved (“you make it less probable that a majority of the whole will have a common motive to invade the rights of other citizens”). When factions formed inside the government, a clever institutional design of checks and balances (first John Adams’s idea, where each branch would have a hand in the others’ domain) would avert excessive harm, so that “ambition must be made to counteract ambition” and, consequently, government will effectively “control itself.”

d. Adams

John Adams was also a founder, statesman, diplomat and eventual President who contributed to American Enlightenment thought. Among his political writings, three stand out: Dissertation on the Canon and Feudal Law (1776), A Defense of the Constitutions of Government of the United States of America, Against the Attack of M. Turgot (1787-8), and Discourses on Davila (1791). In the Dissertation, Adams faults Great Britain for deciding to introduce canon and feudal law, “the two greatest systems of tyranny,” to the North American colonies. Once introduced, elections ceased in the North American colonies, British subjects felt enslaved and revolution became inevitable. In the Defense, Adams offers an uncompromising defense of republicanism. He disputes Turgot’s apology for unified and centralized government, arguing that insurance against consolidated state power and support for individual liberty require separating government powers between branches and installing careful checks and balances. Nevertheless, a strong executive branch is needed to defend the people against “aristocrats” who will attempt to deprive liberty from the mass of people. Revealing the Enlightenment theme of conservatism, Adams criticized the notion of unrestricted popular rule or pure democracy in the Discourses. Since humans are always desirous of increasing their personal power and reputation, all the while making invidious comparisons, government must be designed to constrain the effects of these passionate tendencies. Adams writes: “Consider that government is intended to set bounds to passions which nature has not limited; and to assist reason, conscience, justice, and truth in controlling interests which, without it, would be as unjust as uncontrollable.”

4. Contemporary Work

Invocations of universal freedom draw their inspiration from Enlightenment thinkers such as John Locke, Immanuel Kant, and Thomas Jefferson, but come into conflict with contemporary liberal appeals to multiculturalism and pluralism. Each of these Enlightenment thinkers sought to ground the legitimacy of the state on a theory of rational-moral political order reflecting universal truths about human nature—for instance, that humans are carriers of inalienable rights (Locke), autonomous agents (Kant), or fundamentally equal creations (Jefferson). However, many contemporary liberals—for instance, Graeme Garrard, John Gray and Richard Rorty—fault Enlightenment liberalism for its failure to acknowledge and accommodate the differences among citizens’ incompatible and equally reasonable religious, moral and philosophical doctrines, especially in multicultural societies. According to these critics, Enlightenment liberalism, rather than offering a neutral framework, discloses a full-blooded doctrine that competes with alternative views of truth, the good life, and human nature. This pluralist critique of Enlightenment liberalism’s universalism makes it difficult to harmonize the American Founders’ appeal to universal human rights with their insistence on religious tolerance. However, as previously noted, evidence of Burkean conservatism offers an alternative to the strong universalism that these recent commentators criticize in American Enlightenment thought.

What in recent times has been characterized as the ‘Enlightenment project’ is the general idea that human rationality can and should be made to serve ethical and humanistic ends. If human societies are to achieve genuine moral progress, parochialism, dogma and prejudice ought to give way to science and reason in efforts to solve pressing problems. The American Enlightenment project signifies how America has taken a leading role in promoting Enlightenment ideals during that period of human history commonly referred to as ‘modernity.’ Still, there is no consensus about the exact legacy of American Enlightenment thinkers—for instance, whether republican or liberal ideas are predominant. Until the publication of J. G. A. Pocock’s The Machiavellian Moment (1975), most scholars agreed that liberal (especially Lockean) ideas were more dominant than republican ones. Pockock’s work initiated a sea change towards what is now the widely accepted view that liberal and republican ideas had relatively equal sway during the eighteenth-century Enlightenment, both in America and Europe. Gordon Wood and Bernard Bailyn contend that republicanism was dominant and liberalism recessive in American Enlightenment thought. Isaac Kramnick still defends the orthodox position that American Enlightenment thinking was exclusively Lockean and liberal, thus explaining the strongly individualistic character of modern American culture.

5. References and Further Reading

Bailyn, Bernard. The Ideological Origins of the American Revolution. Harvard: Harvard University Press, 1967.
Ferguson, Robert A. The American Enlightenment. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1997.
Hampson, Norman. The Enlightenment: An Evaluation of its Assumptions. London: Penguin, 1968.
Himmelfarb, Gertrude. The Roads to Modernity: The British, French and American Enlightenments. London: Vintage, 2008.
Israel, Jonathan. A Resolution of the Mind—Radical Enlightenment and the Intellectual Origins of Modern Democracy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2009.
Kramnick, Isaac. Age of Ideology: Political Thought, 1750 to the Present. New York: Prentice Hall, 1979.
May, Henry F. The Enlightenment in America. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1978.
O’Brien, Conor Cruise. The Long Affair: Thomas Jefferson and the French Revolution, 1785-1800. London: Pimlico, 1998.
O’Hara, Kieron. The Enlightenment: A Beginner’s Guide. Oxford: OneWorld, 2010.
Pockock, John G. A. The Machiavellian Moment: Florentine Political Thought and the American Republican Tradition. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1975.
Wilson, Ellen J. and Peter H. Reill. Encyclopedia of the Enlightenment. New York: Book Builders Inc., 2004.
Wood, Gordon. The Creation of the American Republic. Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina Press, 1969.

Author Information

Shane J. Ralston
Email: sjr21@psu.edu
Pennsylvania State University
U. S. A.

Occasionalism

In the minds of most philosophers with a passing familiarity with early-modern philosophy, occasionalism is typically regarded as a laughable ad hoc or ‘for want of anything better’ solution to the mind-body problem, first opened up in Descartes’ Meditations. As typically presented in philosophy textbooks, the doctrine (usually identified exclusively with Nicholas Malebranche) certainly seems laughable: beginning from the assumption that the actual transmission of anything between body and mind is impossible, occasionalism holds that, for example, when my finger is pricked by a needle, no physical effect—neither the puncture of the needle nor the activity of my nerves—reaches my mind, but rather God directly produces the sensation of the prick within my mind on the occasion of the needle’s contact with my finger. Similarly, when I will to retract my finger away from the needle, my incorporeal will is utterly impotent to produce any such corporeal movement, so God again intercedes and directly produces the movement of the finger on the occasion of my willing.

Such supposedly was the doctrine of occasionalism, which, when presented in such a manner, occasions little more than an eye-roll from modern readers. Yet, this “textbook view” of occasionalism (much like the contemporary fixation on Descartes’ Meditations over his Principles of Philosophy) has everything to do with the interests, problems, and concerns of philosophy in the late and post-modern periods, and almost nothing to do with the actual doctrine of occasionalism in its own historical context. Indeed, occasionalism is not peculiar to early-modern philosophy or Cartesianism at all, but was an influential school in both Latin and Islamic medieval philosophy extending back to the tenth century. Moreover, for a strange and systematically theological system of metaphysics, occasionalism is the progenitor of a number of remarkable developments in Western philosophy, some of which laid the foundation for the development of modern science itself.

Introduction
Motivations for Occasionalism
1. Islamic and Latin Medieval Occasionalism
2. Cartesian Occasionalism
Primary Arguments for Occasionalism
The Place of Occasionalism in the History of Philosophy
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources in English
2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

In spite of its historical deficiencies, the aforementioned “textbook view” of occasionalism was not entirely off the mark. The Cartesian occasionalists generally—but not exclusively—made appeal to the doctrine as a solution to the problem of mind-body interaction. Moreover, this interpretation actually has its origins in the period itself. Both G. W. Leibniz and Bernard le Bovier de Fontenelle notably described occasionalism as primarily a reaction to Descartes’ failure to explain the mind-body union (See Leibniz, “to Arnauld, 9 Oct. 1687,” Philosophical Papers, 522; Fontenelle, Doutes, 1:529-30). Nonetheless, Leibniz and Fontenelle were mistaken in their interpretations. As the first true Cartesian occasionalist, Louis de La Forge, argues:

I think most people would not believe me if I said that it is no more difficult to conceive how the human mind, without being extended, can move the body and how the body without being a spiritual thing can act on the mind, and to conceive how a body has the power to move itself and to communicate motion to another body. Yet there is nothing more true. (Traité, 143)

While the commitments of individual philosophers varied, in its pure form, occasionalism was a global denial of causality outside the direct and immediate volitional activity of God—both between bodies and between minds and bodies.

This is important to note as it forms the locus of the distinction between three classic metaphysical models of the causal relationship between God and his Creation: occasionalism, concurrentism, conservationism. Conservationism can best be described as the common view among the lay followers of the Abrahamic faith, as Malebranche himself notes (Recherche, 677). It holds that God created the world in the beginning, but that since that moment and with the exception of miracles, the world runs causally of its own accord and on the basis of its own powers and principles, without the need for God to be continually and perpetually involved. In spite of its mass appeal, conservationism was almost never taken seriously by Christian or Islamic theologians and was denounced as heretical for a variety of reasons that need not concern us here, for the much more important historical distinction was between concurrentism and occasionalism. Owing it origins to Augustine, concurrentism became the causal metaphysic of St. Thomas Aquinas and his legion followers. It holds that both God and finite created causes contribute to the production of particular effects, namely that God “concurs” or assents to the natural activity of the cause and thereby contributes his potency to the production of its effects, without which such a cause would be impotent and incapable of producing its customary effect. Occasionalism, by contrast, holds that finite creatures are utterly impotent by themselves, contribute nothing metaphysically to the production of any effects to which they may be associated, but instead serve only as merely nominal indicators or occasions for the one sole cause in the universe: God. Thus, while Aquinas’ account of the regular operations of nature is grounded in a grand system of agent causes and their patients, for the occasionalist, the regular operations of nature are governed by a system of occasional causes that cohere only on the basis of the regularity of God’s will concerning them.

This raises the question: What exactly is an occasional cause? One example would be a placebo, a designation that could be applied to almost anything, but is understood as such insofar as it serves as the cause of the “placebo effect.” Yet, as has been noted in clinical analyses of the placebo effect, this causal conception is clearly mistaken insofar as a placebo is typically an inert compound or pointless “therapy” that does not actually cause anything in particular, much less its salutary effect. Nonetheless, without the presence and administration of the placebo, the effect would not follow, or not follow as often as it does, and thus a placebo may be understood as an indispensable cause that serves as the occasion for whatever psycho-physical causality that takes place in the body which produces the placebo effect.

So then, what does an occasionalist metaphysic and account of causality look like? Well, to begin with the classic example of mind-body interaction described in the summary: when I look out the window of my office, there is no real causal connection between the clouds and sky as physical objects and the representative idea I have of them in my mind; rather, God immediately and directly produces such a correspondent image in my mind upon the occasion of me turning my head and looking out the window at them. Similarly, there is no real causal connection between the activity of my will to turn my head to the right and look out my window and the physical action of my head turning; for my head moves on the basis of the physical contraction of opposing muscle groups in my neck, which pull on and rotate my cervical vertebrae, thereby effecting the turn. Moreover, for reasons that will be seen, there is no real causal connection between the contraction of these muscles and the movement of my head; rather, God immediately and directly produces the movement of my head on the occasion of the contraction of the muscles in my neck, which are similarly produced by him on the occasion of my will to turn my head to the right.

This elaborate metaphysical and theological description of such a simple action raises the question: Why would any philosopher advance such a bizarre and counter-intuitive theory to explain such basic phenomena?

2. Motivations for Occasionalism

Given the customary prejudice of philosophers towards occasionalism (supposing they’ve heard of it at all), it is necessary to consider the motivation(s) underlying such a strange doctrine, which nonetheless attracted many of the greatest minds of medieval and early-modern philosophy.

The main figures behind the development of occasionalist thought in the Middle Ages were, as might be expected, concerned predominantly with theological issues. Numerous passages in the Old and New Testament are ambiguously suggestive of an occasionalist reading, such as Job 38:12-41, 1 Corinthians 12:6, and Isaiah 26:12. To quote one passage, cited by Malebranche in favor of occasionalism: “This is what the Lord, your protector, says, the one who formed you in the womb: ‘I am the Lord, who made everything, who alone stretched out the sky, who fashioned the earth all by myself’” (Isaiah 44:22). The important part of this quote is not the claim of God (even the conservationists accepted that God acted alone in the moment of creation), but rather Isaiah’s claim that, as Malebranche puts it, “only God acts and forms children in their mother’s womb” (Recherche, 677).

However, such Scriptural testimony was far too ambiguous to inspire or justify occasionalism on its own terms. Rather, occasionalism was born of a dispute centered on the deeply problematic relationship between Greek rationalist philosophy and the dogmas of the Abrahamic religions that seemed incommensurable with this tradition, namely the doctrine of creation ex nihilo and the possibility of miracles. There was a pervasive tendency in later antiquity among those educated in Greek philosophy to be embarrassed by the “abominations of reason,” latent in their religious creeds, which impelled them to attempt a synthesis. These attempts to harmonize Abrahamic monotheism with the philosophy of the pagans invariably provoked a reaction from their less philosophically inclined co-religionists who sought to uphold the dogmas of the Faith without intellectual rationalizations or prevarications. These reactions divide into two almost diametrically opposed camps corresponding to the two great bursts of occasionalist thought in the history of philosophy.

a. Islamic and Latin Medieval Occasionalism

In the Islamic tradition, the thought of the Arab polymath and father of Islamic philosophy, al-Kindi (801-873), marks the tentative beginning of a syncretism of Islam and Greek philosophy. This syncretism was further developed in the 9^th and 10^th centuries by a school of philosophers known as the Mu’tazalites, the premiere representatives of whom were al-Farabi (c. 872-950) and Avicenna (c. 980-1037). The metaphysical system of the Mu’tazalites was a hybrid of Aristotelianism and Neoplatonism typical of late-antiquity. Though al-Farabi and Avicenna remained nominal Muslims, their rationalist philosophical beliefs stood at considerable odds with the depiction of God and his relation to the world in the Qur’an: most notably, their critics accused them of denying the Abrahamic doctrine of creation ex nihilo and being incapable, on account of their necessitarian conception of causality, to explain the existence or possibility of miracles.

This latter issue over miracles in particular attracted the ire of certain Islamic theologians who were followers of a fundamentalist school begun in the early 10^th century by al-Ash’ari (874-936), the most illustrious member of whom was al-Ghazali (1058-1111). The Mutazalites held, in customary rationalist manner, that causes are logically sufficient for the production of their effects and thus entail their existence in an essentially logical and syllogistic manner. While any particular cause (for example fire) may not be in-itself sufficient for the production of its effect (namely burning), given the presence of certain necessary conditions (for example air, and combustible substrate), the effect would follow necessarily from the presence and existence of the cause. That is to say, for fire and a combustible material to be brought together in the presence of oxygen, yet fail to produce burning, was regarded as a logical impossibility tantamount to a formal contradiction.

The objection of the Ash’irites to this principle is not difficult to understand: a natural order that operates on the basis of causes that logically necessitate their effects cannot be reconciled with the existence of miracles, which, as attested to in Holy Scripture, often depend on such an “impossible” disjunction between cause and effect. For example, there is the famous example of the “Burning Bush” from Exodus 3:1-21, which describes a combustible material that is on fire, but was not consumed by the flames. Another example is a story from the Book of Daniel of the three youths (Abednego, Meshach, and Shadrach) who were thrown into Nebuchadnezzar’s “Fiery Furnace,” yet miraculously escaped burning due to interference by an angel of God. Miracles such as these were interpreted literally by Ash’irite theologians and regarded as involving the presence of a natural cause but the absence of its customary effect due to a supernatural intervention by God.

This disjunction of causes and effects in instances of miracles was not itself problematic as long as Jews, Christians, and Muslims believed that God could do the impossible. Yet, such an interpretation of the divine omnipotence was strongly resisted by almost every important theologian of the Abrahamic religions and the orthodox conception of the limits of God’s power was identified as coextensive with the logically possible. To quote the Islamic theologian, al-Ghazali: “No one has power over the Impossible. What the Impossible means is the affirmation of something together with its denial…that which is not impossible is within [God’s] power” (Tahafut, 194). This is a very important point for it requires that, if miracles such as the above did indeed happen, they must have been—pace the assertion of ancient philosophers—logically possible on their own terms. Thus, the concession that God cannot do the impossible puts the onus on the believer in miracles to explain how such causal syncopations are possible. That is to say, it requires the believer to do philosophy—critical analytic philosophy—and thereby defeat the ancient philosophers at their own game.

This Islamic dispute was transferred essentially wholesale to the West through Averroës and Maimonidies in the 12^th century and formed the basis of the nominalist reaction against Thomistic scholasticism, which they regarded as being similarly necessitarian and incompatible with the divine omnipotence.

b. Cartesian Occasionalism

By the time of Descartes, the nature of the occasionalist impulse had changed dramatically. Nowhere among the Cartesian occasionalists does one encounter the deep concern over the divine omnipotence or for reconciling philosophy with the testimony of Scripture typical of the Medievals. Even Malebranche, who—alone among his cohort—offered a few (weak) theological arguments in favor of occasionalism, never seemed bothered by the particular theological concerns of his medieval predecessors, even though—again, alone among his cohort—he demonstrated familiarity with them (See LO, 680). Instead, Cartesian occasionalism was a tendency and development organic to Cartesianism itself, which the successors of Descartes were driven to pursue exclusively under the pressure of severe problems in the Cartesian systems of physics and metaphysics and not from any particular religious motivation. These pressures included:

The Mind-Body Problem

This problem, while hardly unique to Descartes, was nonetheless forced by his substance dualism into a more radical and metaphysical framework than had been the case otherwise. Now, as noted in the introduction, the classic textbook view of occasionalism as an ad hoc solution to Descartes’ mind-body problem is almost entirely without warrant. Nonetheless, the mind-body problem was a particular area of concern for Descartes’ successors and occasionalism provided such a convenient solution that this “textbook” view took hold with considerable facility. Nonetheless, Steven Nadler argues that the mind-body problem was not a “specific” problem engendering Cartesian occasionalism and moreover “was not even recognized as a special case of some more general causal problem” (Nadler, 1997, 76). For the Cartesians, the nature of efficient causality was a metaphysical problem in itself.

The Rejection of Scholastic Forms and Causal Powers

Descartes describes the substantial forms of the Scholastics as having been “introduced by philosophers solely to account for the proper actions of natural things, of which they were supposed to be the principles and bases” (CSMK III, 208). Yet, Descartes is adamant that “no natural action at all can be explained by these substantial forms,” insofar as they “account” for the “proper actions of natural things” by metaphysical reification rather than epistemological explanation. They are thus “occult” and inscrutable (CSMK III, 208-9), and moreover otiose and redundant as explanations of phenomena, which, as Descartes is adamant, may be entirely accounted for in terms of local movements (CSM I, 83).

This mechanistic account of causal interaction allowed for a novel argument against the possibility of corporeal efficacy, which follows from Descartes’ rejection of substantial forms combined with his insistence that the qualities of body are exhausted by their mere geometric extension and whatever minimal features may be directly derived from as much. The point is, nowhere contained in the purely quantitative idea of extension is any notion of qualitative powers, forms, disposition, potentialities, and the like, from which it may be concluded that matter was essentially passive and inert.

Cartesian Nominalism

Unlike the Scholastics who regarded motion to be an accident, the Cartesians regarded motion to be a mode of body—thereby denying the Scholastic presumption of a metaphysically real distinction between a thing and its qualities, and instead insisting that there was no ontological difference between the “modes of being [façons d’ être]” of a thing and the thing itself (Lennon, 1974, 34). Given this, it would be as impossible to conceive a body transferring its motion to another body as it would be possible to conceive a body transferring its shape or divisibility to another body.

Continual Creation

Lastly, there is Descartes’ acceptance and advancement of the doctrine that God preserves the world via continual creation (See CSM II, 33; CSM I, 200). This was a customary supposition of occasionalism since al-Ghazali and the Ash’irite occasionalists. While Descartes’ commitment to this doctrine is insufficiently distinct from what might be maintained by a Thomistic concurrentist to qualify incontrovertibly as occasionalism, his successors would interpret the matter more forcefully and in a manner that rendered the concurrence of secondary causes otiose.

3. Primary Arguments for Occasionalism

Throughout the seven centuries of its history, occasionalist philosophy has been advanced and defended through a plethora of different arguments. Remarkably, there does not seem to be any particular “master argument” that appears across all the figures in this tradition. Certain arguments are more common or carried greater cache than others, but occasionalism was never an axiomatic system of metaphysics, and thus the principles and arguments behind it are more of a liquid coacervate than a structured edifice. Some of the strongest and most common arguments made against the efficacy of secondary causes and in favor of the system of occasional causes shall be examined here.

a. Causation is Not a Phenomenon

In observing a particular causal interaction, one does not see the actual causality underlying the interaction, but only a succession of events. This claim is most commonly identified with Hume, but it is actually of considerable antiquity and has often stood as the opening gambit of occasionalism since its very beginning. It was first advanced by al-Baqillani in the 10^th century and reiterated by al-Ghazali, who argues:

Fire, which is an inanimate thing, has no action. How can one prove that it is an agent? The only argument is from the observation of the fact of burning at the time of contact with fire. But observation only shows that one is with the other, not that it is by it and has no other cause than it. (Tahafut, 186)

Virtually every philosopher associated with occasionalism would repeat this argument in some form or another. Even after the disappearance of medieval occasionalism in the 15^th and 16^th centuries, the argument would resurface among the earliest of the Cartesian occasionalists, Louis de La Forge (1632-1666) and Géraud de Cordemoy (1624-1684). La Forge notes:

I will be told, is it not clear and evident that heavy things move downwards, that light things rise upwards, and that bodies communicate their motion to one another? I agree, but there is a big difference between the obviousness of the effect and that of the cause. The effect is very clear here, for what do our senses show use more clearly than the various movements of bodies? But do they show us the force which carries heavy things downwards, light things upwards, and how one body has the power to make another body move? (Traité, 143; emphasis added)

Cordemoy concurs and reformulates the argument in more classically Cartesian terms, namely concerning colliding bodies:

When we say, for example, that body B drives body C away from its place, if we examine well what is acknowledged for certain in this case, we will only see that body B was moved, that it encountered C, which was at rest, and that since this encounter, the first ceased to be moved [and] the second commenced to be. (Discernement, 137; trans. Albondi, 59)

This is the formula of which Hume is typically given credit.

b. No Forces or Powers

The rejection of ‘forces’ or ‘powers’ internal to a particular piece of matter follows empirically from the above denial that we can actually see causation, as well as rationally from the argument, made in antiquity by Sextus Empiricus: “since…so much divergency is shown to exist in objects, we shall not be able to state what character belongs to the object in respect of its real essence, but only what belongs to it in respect of this particular rule of conduct, or law, or habit, and so on” (Outlines of Pyrrhonism, I. XIV, 163). Avicenna attempted to respond to this point by developing a claim made by Aristotle (See Physics 196b) that postulates an inductive “hidden syllogism” [qiyas khafiyy] tacit within causal judgments that allows for the inference of causal powers:

A tested experience is exemplified by our judgment that scammony purges bile. For when this [observed association] is repeated many times, it no longer belongs to the category of what occurs coincidentally. The mind then judges that it is of the nature of scammony to purge bile, and it acquiesces in it. Thus, purging bile is a necessary accident of scammony…and [scammony] necessitates it [the effect of purging bile] by some proximate power within it, or property in it, or a relation connected with it. It becomes correct [to conclude] through this kind of demonstration that there is a cause in scammony by nature and associated with it, which purges bile. (al-Burhan, 95; trans. Kogan, 87-88)

Avicenna’s ambiguity regarding the correct conclusion of this “demonstration” and the source of necessity between scammony and its purgative power is revealing, particularly in his indecisive conflation of “a cause in scammony by nature” with one merely “associated with it.”

Al-Ghazali seizes on this ambiguity and declares that Avicenna’s “kind of demonstration” underlying causal judgments is not a demonstration at all for it lacks any entailment: “existence with a thing does not prove being by it” (Tahafut, 186). To prove this point, al-Ghazali provides an example:

Suppose there is a blind man whose eyes are diseased, and who has not heard from anyone of the difference between night and day. If one day his disease is cured, and he can consequently see colours, he will guess that the agent of the perception of the forms of colours which has now been acquired by his eyes is the opening of the eyes. (Tahafut, 186)

This particular argument is essentially identical to Hume’s famous example in the Enquiry concerning the causal expectations of Adam when encountering fire and water for the first time (See Enquiry, VI.2, 27).

The Cartesians regarded suppositions of ‘force’ or ‘power’ inhering in bodies as occult properties incapable of being clearly and distinctly understood. Following Descartes, they regarded material bodies as effectively hypostatizations of Euclidian geometry, the qualities of which are exhausted by their mere geometric extension and whatever minimal features may be directly derived from as much. The point is, for the Cartesians, we have a clear and distinct idea of the essence of body as res extensa. Nowhere contained in this purely quantitative idea is any notion of qualitative powers, forms, disposition, potentialities, and the like. As Malebranche asks the reader:

Consult the idea of extension and judge by that idea, which represents bodies if anything does, whether they can have some property other than the passive faculty of receiving various shapes and various motions. Is it not evident to the last degree that properties of extension can consist only in relations of distance? (Dialouges, VII.2 147)

From this minimalist and quantitative conception of matter, the Cartesians concluded that matter was existentially passive and inert and derided the Scholastic-Aristotelian epistemology of causal explanation as fundamentally animistic—a point that seems evident in Aquinas’ claim:

[Real relations exist in] those things which by their own very nature are ordered to each other, and have a mutual inclination…as in a heavy body is found an inclination and order to the centre; and hence there exists in the heavy body a certain respect in regard to the centre and the same applies to other things. (Summa theologica, 1, q. 28, a. 1)

This physics based on internal “inclinations” Descartes categorically rejected, noting that his youthful conception of gravity was based on a (typically Scholastic) equivocation between notions of mind and notions of body:

[W]hat makes it especially clear that my idea of gravity was taken largely from the idea I have of the mind is the fact that I thought that gravity carried bodies towards the centre of the earth as if it had some knowledge of the centre within itself. For this surely could not happen without knowledge, and there can be no knowledge except in a mind. (CSM II, 298. See also: “Letter to Mersenne,” CSMK III 216 and “Letter to Arnauld,” CSMK III 358.)

Descartes’ argument here became a major argument in favor of occasionalism among his successors, particularly by Malebranche, whose mouthpiece in the Dialogues on Metaphysics and on Religion instructs:

Contemplate the archetype of bodies, intelligible extension. This represents them since it is in accordance with it that they all have been made. This idea is entirely luminous…Do you not see clearly that bodies can be moved but they cannot move themselves? You hesitate. Well then, let us suppose that this chair can move itself: Which way will it go? With what velocity? At what time will it take it into its head to move? You would have to give the chair an intellect and a will capable of determining itself…Otherwise, a power of moving itself would be of no use at all to it. (Dialogues, VII, 151; emphasis added)

Malebranche’s claim here is essentially: to ascribe active powers to something that is defined only in terms of geometric extension is like ascribing ‘jealousy’ to a cardboard box. This conclusion is in line with the standard Cartesian accusation against Aristotelianism, namely that, even when stripped of any supposition of final causality, Aristotelian causal explanation inherently projects what are effectively intentional states onto otherwise inanimate objects.

Moreover, the particular argument Malebranche employs to make his point—while novel amongst the Cartesians—is very old indeed. Parmenides famously argued against the possibility of creation by asking: “…what creation wilt thou seek for [what is]? How and whence did it grow? I [shall not] allow thee to say or to think, ‘from that which is not’; for…what need would have driven it on to grow, starting from nothing, at a later time rather than an earlier?” (Simplicus, Commentary on the Physics, 145; Kirk & Raven 347) To this al-Ghazali responded that only inanimate creatures not possessed of a will are strictly subject to the principle of sufficient reason, such “that fire is so created that when it finds two pieces of cotton which are similar, it will burn both of them, as it cannot discriminate between two similar things” (Tahafut, 190). Given their enslavement to the principle of sufficient reason, creatures lacking a will are incapable of self-initiated movement for it would be impossible for them to decide to move in one direction rather than another, or do so at one moment rather than another, given that all points in space and time are qualitatively identical, and thus—in terms of the order of possible reasons—indifferent. Thus al-Ghazali concludes that all change must be initiated by a will with metaphysical capacity to choose and act arbitrarily, thereby distinguishing and picking between identicals differing only by number (Tahafut, 24-7).

This voluntarist reasoning Malebranche weaves into the Cartesian rubric, concluding:

It is clear that no body, large or small, has the power to move itself…We have only two sorts of ideas, ideas of minds and ideas of bodies; and as we should speak only of what we conceive, we should only reason according to these two kinds of ideas. Thus, since the idea we have of all bodies makes us aware that they cannot move themselves, it must be concluded that it is minds which move them. (Recherche, 448)

Yet Malebranche flatly denies that finite human minds have any such capacity to generate movement, insisting that we “have no clear idea of this power soul has over the body” (Ibid., 670). He justifies this claim first on empirical grounds, arguing that, were one to claim:

I know through the inner sensation of my action that I truly have this power…I [would] reply that when they move their arm they have an inner sensation of the actual volition by which they move it; and they are not mistaken in believing that they have this volition…I grant that they have an inner sensation that the arm is moved during the effort; and on this assumption I also agree…that the movement of the arm occurs at the instant we feel this effort…But I deny that this effort, which is only a modification or sensation of the soul…is by itself able to impart motion to the animal spirits, or to determine them. (Ibid.)

c. No Necessary Connection

The argument that cause and effect share no necessary connection between them began with al-Ghazali’s coruscating insight that “the connection between what are believed to be the cause and the effect is not necessary. Take any two things. This is not That; nor can That be This” (Tahafut, 185). This point has both an epistemological and a logico-ontological prongs. The former hinges on what Hume called the “establish’d maxim”: Supposing we have a complete understanding of the quiddities of, say, fire and cotton, al-Ghazali asks: “how can we conceive that one of them should burn, and the other should not? There is no alternative for the other piece” (Tahafut, 188). That is to say, the very fact that cause and effect are epistemologically distinct means that we can always consider the one without the other; and subject to that mere possibility, no logically necessary relation can exist between the two.

The deeper logico-existential prong of al-Ghazali’s “This is not That” insight, which Hume never truly grasped, hinges on the very nature of identity and logical connection itself. A door had been conveniently opened by Avicenna, who insisted that the hallmark of efficient causes is their ontological distinctness from their effects (Metaphysics, 173). Al-Ghazali follows Avicenna on this point, but then poses the question: what does this ontological distinctness entail? A necessary connection requires that one event is logically bound to another, such that the cause is sufficient (given the fulfillment of certain necessary conditions) to bring about the effect. Yet how is this logical connection possible? “This is not That” precisely because two distinct things, as distinct things, cannot be bound of themselves by any necessary connection: “The affirmation of one does not imply the affirmation of the other; nor does its denial imply the denial of the other. The existence of the one is not necessitated by the existence of the other; nor its non-existence by the non-existence of the other” (Tahafut, 185). For example, it is impossible to conceive of a dog while not also conceiving of an animal precisely because there is a necessary relationship between the two — the antecedent entails the consequent as a modus ponens. This is the type of standard that relations of necessity demand. Yet, the relationship between the concept ‘dog’ and the concept ‘animal’ is not causal but rather definitional, the predicate being contained in the subject. Causation, on the other hand, is not a definitional relationship, but rather one that takes place between two otherwise discrete things, and thus cannot include under it any notion of necessity. The occasionalist conclusion he draws from this is that, if two distinct events are to be necessarily conjoined, they can only be so “as the result of the Decree of God, which preceded their existence. If one follows the other, it is because He has created them in that fashion, not because the connection in itself is necessary and indissoluble” (Tahafut, 185; emphasis added).

This principle of al-Ghazali’s, namely that the logical non-identity of cause and effect logically precludes any necessary connection between them, was rigorously and systematically developed by the fourteenth century nominalists William of Ockham and Nicholaus of Autrecourt, forming the touchstone of their skeptical attacks on the Peripatetic scholasticism that had taken over Western philosophy and theology following the work of William of Auvergne and Aquinas in the previous century. It was the Aristotelian conception of ontology as an active, pluralistic, and substantial structure composed of both things as well as real principles internal to them—principles that define the natural order in a deep, interwoven, and rational way, so as to provide philosophy direct access to this order as well as the possibility of offering a systematic and all-encompassing explanation of its operations—that was the primary object of the nominalists’ ire. By contrast, the nominalists regarded the Real as composed of discrete individual singulars.

Ockham paved new ground in the epistemology of causal explanation due to his almost obsessive concern over the divine omnipotence and the possibility of divine interference in any particular instance of cause and effect. If, as Ockham and the “theologians” declared: “Whatever God can produce by means of secondary causes, He can directly produce and preserve without them” (OTh 9: 604.17-20; Philosophical Writings, 25), then it follows that God can create an effect without any antecedent cause and, more importantly, an antecedent ‘cause’ without any consequent effect. Thus the standard of necessary connection, by which the effect must follow from its cause, collapses, and thus inference from one to the other lacks demonstrative warrant:

Between a cause and its effect is a particularly essential order and dependence; nevertheless, the simple knowledge of some one thing does not entail the simple knowledge of some other thing. This is also something that everyone experiences within himself; however perfectly he may know a particular thing, he will never be able to know, with simple and proper knowledge, another thing which he has never previously experienced, either by sensation or intellect. (OTh 1: 241.15-21; translation is the author’s)

Moreover, it is impossible to know, logically or empirically, if God produces any particular effect directly or through secondary causes. That is to say, using occasionalist terminology, if b can be produced by God directly without a, we can never know in any given instance of a followed by b if a actually caused b, if a was merely the occasion for b, or if the two are even connected at all:

[I]t cannot be demonstrated that any effect is produced by a secondary cause, because even though fire always follows when fire is brought close to combustible material, it is possible that the fire is not the cause. For God could have ordained that he alone caused combustion whenever fire is present to a patient close by, just as he has ordained with the Church that when certain words are spoken grace is caused in the soul. (OTh 5:72.21)

Given such an epistemological gap, the positive metaphysical concept of causation collapses and all we are left with is a phenomenal account resting on repeated observation and the continuity of nature.

Ockham had defined an efficient cause in his Summula philosophiae naturalis as “that at whose real existence something has a new different being completely distinct from that cause” (OPh 6: 218.26). Yet, he failed to appreciate the full logical force of this definition. This was left to his successor, Nicholaus of Autrecourt. Autrecourt was adamant that it is impossible to reason from the existence of causal activity of one thing to the existence or effect receptivity of another thing, for: “‘From the fact that some thing is known to be, it cannot be inferred evidently, by evidentness reduced to the first principle, or to the certitude of the first principle, that there is some other thing’…[for] ‘In such an inference…the consequent would not be factually identical with the antecedent’” (Letter to Bernard, §11). Given such a factual non-identity, “the opposite of the consequent would be compatible with whatever is signified by the antecedent, without contradiction” (Letter to Bernard, §15). Autrecourt applies this logical principle directly to the issue of causal explanation, arguing against Duns Scotus that repeated and infallible experience of a conjunction between two things is not demonstrative of the fact that one is the effect of the other:

[O]nly conjecturative habit [habitus conjecturativus], not certainty, is had concerning things known by experience, in the way in which it is said that rhubarb cures cholera, or that a magnet attracts iron. When it is proven [namely by Scotus] that certitude [comes] from the proposition existing in the mind which states that what is usually produced by a non-free cause is its natural effect, I ask what you call a natural cause. A cause which has produced what has happened usually, and which will still produce in the future if [the cause] lasts and is applied? Then the minor premise is not known. Even if something has been produced usually, it is still not certain whether it must be produced in the future. (Exigit, 237)

While neither Ockham nor Autrecourt pursued their causal skepticism into occasionalism, Autrecourt notably acknowledges occasionalism as a possibility. Among the claims that he was forced to retract by the Papal Curia in Avignon were the assertions that “we do not evidently know that anything other than God can be the cause of some effect,” and “we do not evidently know that any cause which is not God to act as an efficient cause” (Quattor atriculi confessati, §§15-18).

Among the Cartesian occasionalists, Malebranche was the only one to employ the ‘no necessary connection’ argument in favor of occasionalism, which Leibniz deemed his “strongest argument for why God alone acts” (Malebranche et Leibniz, 412; trans. by Sleigh, 171). Malebranche avers: “A true cause as I understand it is one such that the mind perceives a necessary connection [liaison nécessaire] between it and its effect” (Recherche, 450). On this basis he concludes:

It is clear that no body, large or small, has the power to move itself…Thus, since the idea we have of all bodies makes us aware that they cannot move themselves, it must be concluded that it is minds which move them. But when we examine our idea of all finite minds, we do not see any necessary connection between their will and the motion of any body whatsoever. On the contrary, we see that there is none and that there can be none.” (Ibid., 670; emphasis added)

Give the utter impotence of bodies vis-à-vis motion, it is obvious by elimination that, if they are moved, they must get such movement from a mind. Yet, by the same reasoning, Malebranche has also shown that this movement cannot come from any finite human mind, for the dictates of such minds are not necessarily connected with their intended effects. There is only one mind that has the power to forge a necessary connection between that which it wills and the effect the will produces:

But when one thinks about the idea of God, i.e., of an infinitely perfect and consequently all-powerful being, one know there is such a connection between His will and the motion of all bodies, that it is impossible to conceive that He wills a body to be moved and that this body not be moved. We must therefore say that only His will can move bodies if we wish to state things as we conceive them and not as we sense them. (Ibid., 448)

d. Continual Creation

Continual creation is a metaphysico-theological doctrine concerning God’s relation to the Creation which maintains that the ontological permanence of the Creation is derived not from itself, but rather through God’s continual volitional preservation of it via the same power from which he created it ex nihilo in the beginning.

Biblical support for the doctrine of continual creation stemmed primarily from John 5:17 and Acts 17:28. Regarding the former, Jesus was persecuted by the Jews for performing works on the Sabbath, to which he responded: “My Father is always working, and so am I.” This passage was cited by Augustine in support of his argument that the biblical claim that God “rests” on the seventh day of creation should not be taken to mean a complete inactivity vis-à-vis the creation, but only rests “in the sense of not creating any new creature” (De genesi ad lit., 4.12). Thus Augustine concludes that:

[E]ven on the seventh day His power ceased not from ruling heaven and earth and all that He had made, for otherwise they would have perished immediately. For the power and might of the Creator, who rules and embraces all, makes every creature abide; and if this power ever ceased to govern creatures, their essences would pass away and all nature would perish. When a builder puts up a house and departs, his work remains in spite of the fact that he is no longer there. But the universe will pass away in the twinkling of an eye if God withdraws His ruling hand. (Summa contra gentiles, 3.65)

Augustine’s understanding of the metaphysics of divine preservation here is obviously nascent, but he is clear on one matter: God need not act in order for the Creation to be extinguished into non-being, but rather merely cease his continual “work.”

This principle became the foundation of the ‘preservation is but continual creation’ doctrine held by both the Thomistic concurrentists and Islamic occasionalists. In the case of the former, Aquinas approvingly quotes Augustine in defense of the doctrine and reiterates the claim that: “Were God to annihilate, it would not be through some action, but through cessation from action” (Summa theologiae, 1a. 104, 3). On this point Aquinas and the Islamic occasionalists were in full agreement; their main disagreement lay in whether or not God’s “work” in preserving the world was metaphysically continuous or discrete. Aquinas followed the Neoplatonic emanationist tradition in siding with the former conception, while the Islamic occasionalists argued for the latter. As Aquinas himself describes their reasoning: “in order to be able to maintain that the world needs to be preserved by God,” they held “that all forms are accidents, and that no accident lasts for two instants, so that things would always be in the process of formation” (Summa contra gentiles, 3.65). The reason for the divergence is that, while both were in agreement as to the metaphysics of annihilation and maintained that “existence is not the nature or essence of any created thing” (Ibid.), the Islamic occasionalists took this principle (along with the identification of divine preservation with creation ex nihilo) to a much more radical conclusion, arguing that finite creatures are inherently driven to non-being by themselves. (Guide, 109a). God’s will is simple and singular: He wills to create a world of things; these things do not have existence as part of their essence; therefore, they immediately vanish into non-being the moment after their creation, upon which God preserves them by recreating them again from the very nothing into which they had vanished (Ibid.).

The upshot of this metaphysic is a static punctiform ontology in which the very notions of “substance” or “natures,” upon which Aristotelian physics and metaphysics is based, collapse. Finite creatures are rendered fragmented shadows of being whose particular features are utterly contingent and the product of mere temporal congruence rather than from any substance ontology. As Maimonides explains, from this doctrine, the Islamic occasionalists denied that “there is a nature in any respect whatever and that the nature of one particular body may require that this and that accident be attached to that body. Quite the contrary, they wish to say that God…created the accidents in question now, without the intermediary of nature—without any other thing” (Guide, 109b). Under such a cinematographic ontology, then, the notion that particular finite creatures could cause effects in other finite creatures is unintelligible, for the world exists as a seriatim of static time slices, each of which are intersticed by vacua of non-being, and thus the states of affairs in any one instant/iteration is not only logically distinct from its successor, but ontologically so as well.

The doctrine of continual creation was inducted into the Cartesian tradition by Descartes himself, who famously notes in the Meditations:

[A] lifespan can be divided into countless parts, each completely independent of the others, so that it does not follow from the fact that I existed a little while ago that I must exist now, unless there is some cause which as it were creates me afresh at this moment—that is, which preserves me. For it is quite clear to anyone who attentively considers the nature of time that the same power and action are needed to preserve anything at each individual moment or its duration as would be required to create that thing anew if it were not yet in existence. (CSM II, 33)

Descartes’ argument concerning time is designed to occlude Hobbes’ and Gassendi’s conservationist mechanism—as well as the belief of the common person—whereby God creates the universe in the beginning, animates it with motion, then steps back from the machine, which continues to exist and operate of its own accord (See CSM II, 254). Yet Descartes’ conception of continual creation seems to be quite different from that of the Islamic occasionalists. First, as Kenneth Clatterbaugh points out, “Descartes only states that the continued existence of substances requires God’s continuous creation; he says nothing about the need to re-create all its states” (Clatterbaugh, 39). Moreover, nowhere does Descartes argue that a body’s causal capacities are dependent upon such recreation, nor does he advance the Ash’irite claim that the nature of such recreation is metaphysically discrete insofar as creatures lapse back into non-being immediately after the moment of their creation.

Regardless, many of Descartes’ successors saw a radicalization of this doctrine as a perfect justification for their occasionalism. Antione Le Grand, for example, follows Descartes in maintaining that “we must conclude that all Creatures before God’s Decree were nothing, and consequently that of themselves they have no necessity to exist” (Philosophia veterum, I, II, 14, 72). Unlike Descartes, however, he is adamant that God’s concourse preserves things “not only as to the Existence, but as to their Essence also” (Ibid., 12, 70). That is, their particular states. Similarly, La Forge advances a powerful argument for the metaphysical powerlessness of bodies form the continual creation doctrine:

I…claim that there is no creature, spiritual or corporeal, which can cause change in it or in any of its parts, in the second moment of their creation, if the Creator does not do so himself. Since it was He who produced this part of matter in place A, for example, not only must he continue to produce it if he wishes it to continue to exist but also, since he cannot create it everywhere or nowhere, he must put it in place B himself if he wishes it to be there. (Traité, 147)

That is to say, even if a body is set in motion by God, it makes no sense to describe it as possessing motion or anything of the sort, for all motion can be in such a theological framework is the annihilation and recreation of the body in different places at different temporal intervals. This point, which revives the conception of motion held by the Islamic occasionalists, is finally made explicit by Malebranche: “The moving force of a body is, then, simply the efficacy of the volition of God who conserves it successively in different places” (Dialouges, VII.11, 159). Motion then is cinematographic: each successive frame bears no connection to the prior frame, there is no transference of properties among the depicted objects between each frame, and indeed the film itself (as a metaphor for substantiality) is patently incapable of such transmission:

[L]et us imagine that the ball is moved and that, in the line of its motion, it encounters another ball at rest…it is not the first ball that moves the second. That is clear from the [following] principle. One body could not move another without communicating to it some of its moving force. Now, the moving force of a body in motion is simply the volition of the Creator who conserves it successively in different places. It is not a quality that which belongs to the body.” (Dialouges, VII.11, 159)

4. The Place of Occasionalism in the History of Philosophy

For such a widely deprecated—if not forgotten—school of philosophy, occasionalism was nonetheless of staggering importance to the development of philosophical modernity. Locke declined to publish two essays he wrote against occasionalism because “he looked upon [occasionalism] to be an opinion that would not spread, but was to die of itself, or at least do no great harm” (Posthumous Works, 210). Locke was undoubtedly prescient in this estimation, but only because the influence of occasionalism was to be felt not in its positive metaphysic, but rather in its skeptical epistemology.

The first casualty of this skepticism was the chimerical Neoplatonism of Ammonius, Plotinus, and their many scions, which was virtually synonymous with philosophy itself in late-antiquity and the Early Middle Ages. It was this philosophy—taken to its apogee by Avicenna—that was the primary target of al-Ghazali’s withering criticism. Neo-Platonism never recovered from this assault (except perhaps in nineteenth-century German idealism) and was instead replaced by the classical Aristotelianism advanced by Muslim philosophers in al-Andalus, most notably Averroës. In the Latin West the order was somewhat reversed as the indigenous Platonism of Eriugena, William of Conches, and Abelard, was replaced by the influx of Aristotelian ideas arriving North from Moorish Spain. Yet, medieval philosophy did not find its “completion” in the Aristotelian scholasticism of William of Auvergne and Aquinas; for, following the condemnations of 1270 and 1277 and the University of Paris, many of which implicated the new Aristotelian theology, skeptical philosophy witnessed a resurgence in Western thought for the first time since antiquity.

Nominalism, the third and final of the great philosophical schools of the Middle Ages, was caustically critical of the pretentions of Thomism; and against such a metaphysic advanced many of the same logical and epistemological arguments made by al-Ghazali and the Islamic occasionalists. Neither Ockham nor Autrecourt were interested in developing a systematic metaphysics and thus refrained from pushing these arguments into an actual espousal of occasionalism. The importance of nominalism lies both in the counter it provided to the domination of Aristotelian scholasticism, as well as the not so minor fact that nominalism was the first rigorously empiricist philosophy in Western history. While certain philosophical schools of antiquity (namely Epicureanism and the Empiric medical school) had exhibited empiricist tendencies, the general inclination of ancient thought was to either combine—to the point of conflation—rational speculative reasoning with empirical observation, or to flatly privilege the former over the latter. No tradition of antiquity had justified empiricism to the same epistemological and metaphysical extent as did Ockham and his followers.

As ironic as it might seem concerning a theocentric metaphysics that regarded God as doing basically everything, the cardinal contribution of occasionalism, then, was to the development of an empiricist epistemology of causal explanation that stood as a cornerstone of modern philosophy and science. The hostility of the occasionalists to secondary causation and the natural potentialities of created things—which had been accepted virtually without question in antiquity—formed the basis of the early-modern attack on the occult forces and powers of scholasticism, not only in spirit but in the particular arguments employed as well. A commonly held belief of ancient metaphysics and natural philosophy was that the inviolable regularity of nature must be predicated on the natural activities of things. Even Sextus Empiricus, the arch-skeptic, warns: “if cause were non-existent everything would have been produced by everything and at random. Horses, for instance, might be born, perchance, of flies, and elephants of ants” (Outlines of Pyrrhonism, iii.18). This is a puzzling claim, for, if causality were indeed non-existent, nothing would produce anything. Yet, this is not how the ancient mind understood the metaphysics of causation: production was an ontological given, “causes” merely directed the power of the demiurge, ensuring that like produces like and so on. Such an understanding remained, in one form or another, down to Aquinas and Suaréz. Occasionalism, in rejecting the efficacy of such natural causes to guide the operations of Nature, was required to posit some principle in its place that would provide for the observed regularity and order therein. The occasionalist response was simple: given that God was the total cause of every event in nature, the regularity of the natural world was a direct extension of the regularity of the divine mind. In this way the ancient understanding of nature as governed by active powers and potentialities was replaced by the modern understanding of nature as governed by immutable laws. Lastly, the occasionalist rejection of the necessity of the connection between cause and effect had a direct and undeniable influence on Hume, who was a studious and astute reader of Malebranche (Treatise, 158-160). Moreover, it was precisely such a skeptical principle—and its obvious upshot that reality is non-deducible—that was to finally nail shut the coffin lid on rationalist-speculative natural philosophy once and for all.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources in English

Al-Ghazali. Tahafut Al-Falasifah. Translated by Sabih Ahmad Kamali. Lahore, Pakistan: Pakistan Philosophical Congress, 1963.
Autrecourt, Nicholas of. His Correspondence with Master Giles and Bernard of Arezzo. Translated by L.M. de Rijk. Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1994.
Autrecourt, Nicholas of. The Universal Treatise. Translated by Leonard A. Kennedy, Richard E. Arnold, and Arthur E. Millward. Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press, 1971.
Averroes. The Incoherence of the Incoherence. Translated by Simon van Den Bergh. 2 vol. London: Messrs Luzac & Company Ltd., 1969.
Avicenna. The Metaphysics of The Healing. Translated by Michael E. Marmura. Provo, UT: Brigham Young University Press, 2005.
Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. Translated by John Cottingham et. al., 3 vol. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.
Geulincx, Arnold. Metaphysics. Translated by Martin Wilson. Wisbech, UK: Christoffel Press, 1999
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by L.A. Selby-Bigge, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1957.
Hume, David. A Treatise on Human Nature. Edited by L.A. Selby-Bigge, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1955.
La Forge, Louis de. Treatise on the Human Mind. Translated by Desmond M. Clarke. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1997.
Maimonides, Moses. The Guide of the Perplexed. Translated by Shlomo Pines. Chicago, IL: The University of Chicago Press, 1963.
Malebranche, Nicolas. Dialogues on Metaphysics. Translated by Willis Doney. New York, NY: Abaris Books, 1980.
Malebranche, Nicolas. The Search After Truth. Translated by Thomas M. Lennon & Paul J. Olscamp. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1980.
Malebranche, Nicolas. Treatise on Nature and Grace. Translated by Patrick Riley. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1992.
Ockham, William of. Philosophical Writings. Translated by Philotheus Boehner. Edinburgh: Nelson and Sons, 1957.

b. Secondary Sources

Ablondi, Fred. Gerauld de Cordemoy: Atomist, Occasionalist, Cartesian. Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press, 2005.
Alon, Ilai. “Al-Ghazali on Causality.” Journal of the American Oriental Society 100 (1980): 397-405.
Battail, Jean-François. L’avocate philosophe Géraud de Cordemoy. The Hauge, Martinus Nijhoff, 1973.
Binyamin Abrahamov. “Al-Ghazali’s Theory of Causality.” Studia Islamica 67 (1988): 75-98.
Clarke, Desmond. “Causal Powers and Occasionalism from Descartes to Malebranche.” In Descartes Natural Philosophy, edited by Stephen Gaukroger, John Schuster, and John Sutton, 131-148. London: Routledge, 2000.
Clatterbaugh, Kenneth. “Cartesian Causality, Explanation, and Divine Concurrence.” History of Philosophy Quaterly 12 (1995): 195-206.
Clatterbaugh, Kenneth. The Causation Debate in Modern Philosophy 1637-1739. New York: Routledge, 1999.
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Author Information

Jason Jordan
Email: jjordan4@uoregon.edu
University of Oregon
U. S. A.

Pierre Hadot (1922-2010)

Pierre Hadot, classical philosopher and historian of philosophy, is best known for his conception of ancient philosophy as a bios or way of life (manière de vivre). His work has been widely influential in classical studies and on thinkers, including Michel Foucault. According to Hadot, twentieth- and twenty-first-century academic philosophy has largely lost sight of its ancient origin in a set of spiritual practices that range from forms of dialogue, via species of meditative reflection, to theoretical contemplation. These philosophical practices, as well as the philosophical discourses the different ancient schools developed in conjunction with them, aimed primarily to form, rather than only to inform, the philosophical student. The goal of the ancient philosophies, Hadot argued, was to cultivate a specific, constant attitude toward existence, by way of the rational comprehension of the nature of humanity and its place in the cosmos. This cultivation required, specifically, that students learn to combat their passions and the illusory evaluative beliefs instilled by their passions, habits, and upbringing. To cultivate philosophical discourse or writing without connection to such a transformed ethical comportment was, for the ancients, to be as a rhetorician or a sophist, not a philosopher. However, according to Hadot, with the advent of the Christian era and the eventual outlawing, in 529 C.E., of the ancient philosophical schools, philosophy conceived of as a bios largely disappeared from the West. Its spiritual practices were integrated into, and adapted by, forms of Christian monasticism. The philosophers’ dialectical techniques and metaphysical views were integrated into, and subordinated, first to revealed theology and then, later, to the modern natural sciences. However, Hadot maintained that the conception of philosophy as a bios has never completely disappeared from the West, resurfacing in Montaigne, Rousseau, Goethe, Thoreau, Nietzsche, and Schopenhauer, and even in the works of Descartes, Spinoza, Kant, and Heidegger.

Hadot’s conception of ancient philosophy and his historical narrative of its disappearance in the West have provoked both praise and criticism. Hadot received a host of letters from students around the world telling him that his works had changed their lives, perhaps the most fitting tribute given the nature of Hadot’s meta-philosophical claims. Unlike many of his European contemporaries, Hadot’s work is characterized by lucid, restrained prose; clarity of argument; the near-complete absence of recondite jargon; and a gentle, if sometimes self-depreciating, humor. While Hadot was an admirer of Nietzsche and Heidegger, and committed to a kind of philosophical recasting of the history of Western ideas, Hadot’s work lacks any eschatological sense of the end of philosophy, humanism, or the West. Late in life, Hadot would report that this was because he was animated by the sense that philosophy, as conceived and practiced in the ancient schools, remains possible for men and women of his era: “from 1970 on, I have felt very strongly that it was Epicureanism and Stoicism which could nourish the spiritual life of men and women of our times, as well as my own” (PWL 280).

Biography
Philology and Method
Early Work: Plotinus and the Simplicity of Vision
What is Ancient Philosophy?
Spiritual Practices
The Transformation of Philosophy after the Decline of Antiquity
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Pierre Hadot was born in Paris in 1922. Educated as a Catholic, at age 22 Hadot began training for the priesthood. However, following Pope Pius XII’s encyclical, Humani Generis, of 1950, Hadot left the priesthood, marrying for a first time in 1953. Between 1953 and 1962, Hadot studied the Latin patristics and was trained in philology. At this time, Hadot was also greatly interested in mysticism. In 1963, he published Plotinus: or The Simplicity of Vision, on the great Neoplatonic philosopher. During this period he also produced two of the first studies about Wittgenstein written in the French-language. Hadot was elected director of studies at the fifth section of the École Pratique des Hautes Études in 1964, and he married his is second wife, the historian of philosophy Ilsetraut Hadot, in 1966. From the mid-1960s, Hadot’s attention turned to wider studies in ancient thought, culminating in two key works: Exercices spirituels et philosophie antique, written in 1981 (translated into English in 1995 as Philosophy as a Way of Life [PWL] ) and Qu’est-ce que la philosophie antique?, written in 1995 (translated into English in 2002 as What is Ancient Philosophy? [WAP] ). Hadot was named professor at the Collège de France in 1982, where he held the chair for the History of Greek and Roman Thought (chaire d’histoire de la pensée hellénistique et romaine). Hadot retired from this position to become professeur honoraire at the Collège in 1991. He continued to translate, write, give interviews, and publish until shortly before his death in April 2010.

2. Philology and Method

Hadot would always insist that his groundbreaking work on ancient philosophy as a way of life arose from his early academic training as a philologist. Throughout his career, Hadot was involved in compiling, editing, and translating ancient Latin and Greek texts, including Marcus Aurelius’ Meditations, Ambrose of Milan’s Apology of David, Plotinus’ works, and as well as the theological works of the Roman rhetorician Marius Victorinus. The study of philology, Hadot claimed, was beneficial for him first of all as a kind of ethical exercise, engendering interpretive humility and attention to historical and textual detail. Secondly, it led him to raise the strictly literary problem concerning the way ancient philosophy was written. His reflections on this problem led Hadot to the meta-philosophical considerations concerning philosophy as a way of life seen in his mature work. Generally speaking, Hadot observed, “the philosophical works of Greco-Roman antiquity almost always perplex . . . contemporary readers . . . even . . . specialists in the field” (PWL 61). The reason is the apparently strange, disordered, circumlocutory, even incoherent nature of ancient philosophical writings, whether we consider Plato’s dialogues with their literary settings, myths or “likely stories”; the occasional letters of an Epicurus or a Seneca; Marcus Aurelius’ apparently desultory notes, injunctions, and aphorisms; or even Aristotle’s reputedly more “systematic” works, which are nevertheless often repetitious, punctuated by digressions, and sometimes inconclusive.

According to Hadot, these literary features seem odd only insofar as readers try, erroneously, to read ancient texts with presuppositions shaped by their reading of modern authors. Philosophical authors in the twenty-first century write under very different social, political, institutional, and technological constraints than their ancient antecedents. In order to understand why the ancient philosophers wrote as they did, Hadot argued, readers need to cultivate a historical sense of “the concrete conditions in which they wrote, all the constraints that weighed upon them: the framework of the school, the very nature of philosophia, literary genres, rhetorical rules, dogmatic imperatives, and traditional modes of reasoning” (PWL 61). Readers must be prepared, in this light, to distinguish between what an author may have wanted to say, as against what he was required in his specific tradition and context to say, and what he was likewise obliged to pass over or leave unsaid” (PWL 64; PAH 64).

In different works, Hadot specified these constraints shaping the ancient philosophical texts. The ancient texts were dictated to scribes and intended to be read aloud. In general, ancient culture was one in which writing was still a relatively new phenomenon, set against the wider primacy of the spoken word—as reflected in the famous Platonic criticisms of writing. Ancient philosophy was largely carried out in the form of spoken dialogue between students and their teachers, so that—as Socrates had already insisted (4c)—students would be drawn to actively discover the truth on their own. Hadot suggests that by recognizing how these works retain and mirror the features of the spoken interchanges upon which they were modeled, modern readers can begin to understand many of the characteristic hesitations, starts and stops, repetitions, and digressions in ancient texts.

The oral bases of ancient philosophical teaching are again reflected in considerations concerning the addressees of these works. “Unlike their modern counterparts, none of these philosophical productions, even the systematic works, is addressed to everyone,” Hadot argued (PWL 64). The exceptions here are expressly exoteric texts like the Platonic dialogues, written with the “protreptic” purpose of attracting new students to philosophy, or like Aristotle’s practical writings, which are specifically addressed to potential statesmen or legislators (WAP 90). Otherwise, ancient philosophical writings were conceived within, and directed toward the members of, the philosophical schools. They reflect the philosophical subjects, techniques, and propositions developed in oral exercises, classes, and teachings, as well as the wider goals of philosophical paideia (4a).

In order to understand the form and intention of many ancient works, Hadot emphasized, the reader must understand the institutional frameworks of the ancient philosophical schools (the Platonic academy, the Aristotelian Lyceum, the Stoa, the Epicurean garden, and the later Platonist schools). Aristotle’s extant works, which were lecture notes seemingly compiled by students or a later redactor within the Lyceum, are only the most obvious case. Part of the curricula in Platonic and Stoic schools, Hadot emphasized, were formalized exercises in dialectics: discussing, through questions and answers, particular theses (such as, “virtue can be taught”) in a way which goes toward explaining the preeminence of the dialogue form in ancient philosophical writing. Even the later, more systematic forms of philosophical treatise that emerged within Platonism in particular, Hadot claimed, must be understood “from the perspective of dialectical and exegetical scholarly exercises” as attempts to synthesize and order the whole of doctrine which had emerged with the school (PWL 63-4). Again, particularly in the imperial period of late antiquity, a large amount of ancient philosophical writings and teaching began to study commentary rather than the original works of the different schools. This was a literary genre in which great weight was given to arguments from authority, in a way that anticipated the medieval scholastics. Different philosophical traditions developed particular stylistic features, such as characteristic images, turns of phrase, or highly formulaic dogmata, which later exegetes were more or less compelled to use, “independent, if one may say so, of the author’s will” (PWL 62).

Hadot’s work in philology, and his sensitivity to the institutional and traditional constraints shaping ancient works, gave rise in his thought to an acute sense of the role played in the history of thought by misappropriations, mistranslations, and creative mistakes. The high status afforded in later classical thought to formulae, images, phrases, and patterns of argument in the schools’ founding texts saw many instances of these philosophical formulae (like “know thyself” or “nature loves to hide”) being borrowed, misappropriated, and given new meaning in the texts of different philosophical traditions, and in the encounter between Hellenistic paganism and Jewish and Christian monotheisms. Later exegetes’ determination to systematize earlier texts and to render them wholly consistent in the light of accepted understandings, together with the supposition that earlier masters could neither be mistaken nor contradict themselves, led to problematic or arbitrary systematizations which nevertheless underlay important evolutions in the history of ideas. Hadot adduces in this context the four- or five-tiered Neoplatonic ontological hierarchies drawn from Plato’s dialogues and Augustine’s positing of a “heaven of heavens” on the basis of a Greek mistranslation of Psalm 113:16. Hadot devoted an early essay to showing how the entire Neoplatonic interpretation of the Parmenides, a subject of great later importance, rested on Porphyry’s erroneous introduction of a distinction between “being” (Gr. ousia) as an infinitive (Fr. être) and as a participle (Fr: étant) to explain the “pure transcendental act” (étant) of the One Beyond Being (être).

3. Early Work: Plotinus and the Simplicity of Vision

Hadot’s first book, Plotinus, or the Simplicity of Vision, was published in 1963. It shows the first fruits of his philological training over the previous decade and his distinct perspective upon ancient philosophical writings. The book was commissioned as a title in a series of works on the lives, or psychobiographies, of famous authors. Hadot begins by underlining the difficulties associated with trying to write a biography of a thinker about whose life we have little testimony (PSV 77-78), who blushed even at having his portrait made, and whose entire philosophy was devoted to the transcendence of his mundane, bodily self —as a sculptor transforms the stone upon which he works (PSV 21; Enneads I.6, 9). Hadot also urges caution, as he will later in his writings on Aurelius (5a) in trying to infer any biographical or psychological insight concerning the author from a work like Plotinus’ Enneads, whose modes of arguing, and many of whose images and figures of speech, “are not spontaneous: [but] traditional and imposed by the texts to be commented upon” in the Platonic heritage of which Plotinus was a legatee (PSV 17).

With that said, Plotinus, or the Simplicity of Vision (PSV) importantly anticipates many of Hadot’s later arguments on ancient philosophy. Hadot tells us in the autobiographical interviews of The Present Alone is Our Happiness that as a young man, he had undergone some kind of mystical experience (PAH 5-6). This was an experience that shaped Hadot’s own initial scholarly research, including several of the first French-language articles on Wittgenstein’s philosophy, and his continuing interest in “unitary experience.” It can, arguably, be seen to underlie Hadot’s repeated, central claim that the classical philosophies were rooted in certain paradigmatic experiences of existence (4b). In any case, Hadot argues in PSV that the famous Neoplatonic metaphysics of the One, the Ideas, and the world-psyche is not the abstract, purely theoretical, otherworldly construction it is often presented as being. Rather, Hadot claims, in Plotinus’ Enneads the language of metaphysics “is used to express an inner experience. All these levels of reality become levels of inner life, levels of the self” (PSV 27). For Hadot, Plotinus’ metaphysical discourse is animated by a “fundamental but inexpressible experience.” This is what gives his work a “unique, incomparable, and irreplaceable tonality” despite Plotinus’ open and avowed citation of inherited Platonic tropes and arguments (PSV 19). For Hadot, Plotinus’ system revolves around the core, existential claim that the human self is not irrevocably separated from its eternal model, the transcendent One or Good. Indeed, at the height of the philosopher’s contemplative ascent, we are called to supra-intellectual identity with this Good: “We then become this eternal self, we are moved by unutterable beauty . . . we identify ourselves with divine Thought itself” (PSV 27). The only autobiographical passage in the Enneads, Hadot notes, involves Plotinus’ testimony about this mystical union (“I become One with the divine, and I establish myself in it” (Enneads IV 8, 1 4), whose content is such that the philosopher is drawn to wonder “how is it possible that I should come down now, and how was it ever possible for my soul to come to be within my body . . .” (Enneads IV 8, 1, 8-9; PSV 25).

In Hadot’s later writings, Plotinus’ philosophical discourse cannot be separated from, but is rather rooted in, the spiritual biography of the philosopher himself. Indeed, PSV already stresses the way that in classical antiquity, certainly in the imperial era of Plotinus, philosophy involved the call to a transformation of individuals’ way of living: a “conversion of attention,” away from “vain preoccupations and exaggerated worries” (PSV 30-31). The philosophical master like Plotinus, in this setting, was less a professor or teacher in modes we would recognize, than a spiritual guide. In Hadot’s words: “he exhorted his charges to conversion, and then directed his new converts . . . . to the paths of wisdom. He was a spiritual advisor” (PSV 75-6). Nevertheless, Porphyry reports that even Plotinus himself was able to achieve mystical union with the One, or Good, only four times in the six years Porphyry was at the master’s school in Rome. The philosopher can at most prepare himself and his charges for such ultimately passive, or receptive, experiences of unity with the Good (compare PSV 55-56). The means to prepare oneself was through the practice of spiritual exercises such as dietary (and other) forms of ascesis (PSV 82) and regular contemplative practices. More than this, PSV situates Plotinus’ later preoccupation with ethical concerns, and cultivating the virtues of benevolence, gentleness, simplicity, and respect for others as part of a kind of ever-renewed effort of the philosopher, between his transitory, mystical experiences, to remain mindful of the higher Good he has contemplatively glimpsed (PSV 65, 86).

For all of Hadot’s evident enthusiasm for Plotinus’ philosophy, however, PSV concludes with an assessment of the modern world’s inescapable distance from Plotinus’ thought and experience. Hadot distances himself from Plotinus’ negative assessment of bodily existence, and he also displays a caution in his support for mysticism, citing the skeptical claims of Marxism and psychoanalysis about professed mysticism, considering it a lived mystification or obfuscation of truth (PSV 112-113). Hadot would later recall that, after writing the book in a month and returning to ordinary life, he had his own uncanny experience: “. . . seeing the ordinary folks all around me in the bakery, I . . . had the impression of having lived a month in another world, completely foreign to our world, and worse than this—totally unreal and even unlivable.” Hadot’s work after 1965 increasingly turned away from Neoplatonism, in particular, and the phenomena of mysticism, in general, and to studies of the divergent ancient philosophical schools, especially those of the Hellenistic and Roman, or imperial, eras.

4. What is Ancient Philosophy?

a. Philosophical Discourse versus Philosophy

Hadot often stressed that his conception of philosophy as a way of life, long before this idea became fashionable, emerged out of the scholarly attempt to understand the unusual literary forms of ancient philosophical writing (see 2). Hadot emphasized that he in no way denied or wanted to downplay “the extraordinary ability of the ancient philosophers to develop theoretical reflection on the most subtle problems of the theory of knowledge, logic, or physics.” Nevertheless, if modern readers are to understand how this theoretical reflection is conveyed in extant ancient writings, Hadot argued that readers are compelled to adopt a perspective “different from that which corresponds to the idea people usually have of philosophy” (WAP 3).

According to Hadot’s position as developed in What is Ancient Philosophy?, philosophical discourse must in particular be situated within a wider conception of philosophy that sees philosophy as necessarily involving a kind of existential choice or commitment to a specific way of living one’s entire life. According to Hadot, one became an ancient Platonist, Aristotelian, or Stoic in a manner more comparable to the twenty-first century understanding of religious conversion, rather than the way an undergraduate or graduate student chooses to accept and promote, for example, the theoretical perspectives of Nietzsche, Badiou, Davidson, or Quine. Hadot cites as a particularly striking instance the case of Polemo, later head of the Academy, who decided then and there to adopt the Platonic philosophical bios after being dared by friends to listen to a lecture of Xenocrates after a night of drunken debauchery (WAP 98).What was involved in such cases was not solely the student’s intellectual assent to an intellectual doctrine or “-ism” in more or less complete isolation from the student’s wider life. Rather, one feature of philosophical writings across different schools was a sometimes caustic criticism of men who professed some teaching or refined way of speaking “ . . . but contradict themselves in the conduct of their own lives.” As Hadot writes in WAP, “According to the Stoic Epictetus, [such people] talk about the art of living like human beings, instead of living like human beings themselves . . . as Seneca put it, they turn true love of wisdom (philosophia) into love of words (philologia).” Traditionally, people who developed an apparently philosophical discourse without trying to live their lives in accordance with their discourse, and without their discourse emanating from their life experience, were called sophists (WAP 174).

Hadot argues in this light that ancient philosophical writings must always be situated in relation to the existential choice of a certain mode of living that characterizes the different ancient philosophies (4b; WAP 3). This need can be seen clearly enough by considering the different genres, or language games, of ancient philosophical writings, and noting specifically that these included letters addressed to individual students’ concerns (Seneca, Epicurus); meditations, or hypomnemata (memory aids), addressed by the student to himself (as in the case of Marcus Aurelius) (5a); consolations against loss and hardships (Boethius, Seneca); studies devoted to mundane stations in life (Of Marriage [Cleanthes], On Leisure [Seneca]); biographies of philosophers (Xenephon, Diogenes Laertius); and works enjoining particular practical conduct (Of Just Dealings [Epicurus], How to Live Amongst Men [Diogenes]). But in WAP, Hadot specifies a series of particular ways philosophical writings relate to ancient philosophy, conceived of as some specific choice of a manière de vivre. First, philosophical discourse aims to do specific things with words, concerning those who will read them. Philosophical discourse, in Hadot’s words, “is a privileged means by which the philosopher can act upon himself and others: for if it is the expression of the existential option of the person who utters it, discourse always has, directly or indirectly, a function which is formative, educative, psychagogic, and therapeutic” (WAP 176). Hadot sometimes cites in this connection Epicurus’ justification for his pursuit of theoretical physics: to reassure mortals against fear concerning death and our imaginings of active, interventionist gods. But here also Hadot’s stress (see 2) on the spoken, dialogic foundation and model for many ancient writings applies. As when we speak directly to a particular individual, so ancient philosophical discourse “is always intended to produce an effect, a habitus within the soul, or to provoke a transformation of the self” of its addressee. (loc cit.) Secondly, in a way closer to how philosophy tends to be conceived of today, philosophical discourse involved the construction of more or less formalized systems—but this was in order to explain and justify the different schools’ different conceptions of the good life. Whichever philosophical school’s conception of the good life is chosen, Hadot explains, “it will be necessary to disengage the presuppositions, implications, and consequences of each attitude with great precision” (WAP 175). It was on this primarily practical basis that the different ancient schools each developed their own technical languages, metaphysical conceptions of humanity’s place within the cosmos, ethical teachings defining one’s relationship to others, and epistemological doctrines about the rules of correct reasoning and argument (WAP 176). Characteristically, Hadot stresses that even the later exegetical systematizations, treatises, and dense summaries of doctrine that emerged in later antiquity were related to the exigencies associated with trying to form students who lived in a certain manner. For this to be possible, students (prokopta) would need to be able at any time to call to mind the school’s key precepts, in particular when they faced temptations or difficulties in their lives. Such a timely recollection of the rules of life was facilitated by having these systematizations and summaries available as written hypomnemata (WAP 176-7).

b. Philosophy as a Way of Life

Hadot’s founding meta-philosophical claim is that since the time of Socrates, in ancient philosophy “the choice of a way of life [was] not . . . located at the end of the process of philosophical activity, like a kind of accessory or appendix. On the contrary, its stands at the beginning, in a complex interrelationship with critical reaction to other existential attitudes . . .” (WAP 3). All the schools agreed that philosophy involves the individual’s love of and search for wisdom. All also agreed, although in different terms, that this wisdom involved “first and foremost . . . a state of perfect peace of mind,” as well as a comprehensive view of the nature of the whole and humanity’s place within it. They concurred that attaining to such Sophia, or wisdom, was the highest Good for human beings. All ancient philosophical schools agreed that, by contrast, most people live unwise lives most of the time. These lives are characterized by unnecessary forms of suffering and disorder, caused by their ignorance or unconsciousness concerning the true source of human happiness. In the view of all philosophical schools, Hadot claims that “mankind’s principal cause of suffering, disorder and unconsciousness were the passions: that is, unregulated desires and exaggerated fears. People are prevented from truly living, it was taught, because they are dominated by the passions” (PWL 83). Political society in all but the best regimes, while natural to human beings, was agreed to be a further cause of individuals’ having deeply habituated, false beliefs concerning human nature and concerning what is good for them to pursue and to avoid. Ancient philosophers thus conceived of philosophy as involving a therapy of the soul, or “remedy for human worries, anguish, and misery brought about for the Cynics, by social constraints and conventions; for the Epicureans, by the quest for false pleasures; for the Stoics, by the pursuit of pleasure and egoistic self-interest; and for the skeptics, by false opinions” (WAP 102).

The disagreements between the ancient philosophies concerned the way the happiness of wisdom was to be conceived of and pursued. For Epicureanism, wisdom involved the pursuit of a particular species of pleasure; whereas for Platonism, Aristotelianism, and Stoicism, some conception of virtue or the Good was prioritized as the one necessary element. But the Platonic conception of this Good, of course, differs markedly from the Peripatetic and Stoic ideals. Each philosophical perspective, Hadot moreover claims, responded to a different, specific experience of the world: as in Epicureanism, “the voice of the flesh: ‘not to be hungry, not to be thirsty, not to be cold’ ” (WAP 115); or in Stoicism, the sense expressed by Epictetus that people are unhappy because they passionately seek things which they cannot obtain and flee evils which are inevitable (WAP 127). Then there are the disagreements between the ancient schools concerning the place and role of intellectual contemplation, and the elaboration of theoretical dogmata, in pursuing the good life. These range from the Aristotelian approach, which seeks out what Aristotle, in the opening pages of The Parts of Animals, calls the “incredible pleasure” (645a7) of investigating and contemplating all the works of nature as an end in itself; to the skeptics’ position, which sought eudaimonia (happiness, or welfare) through suspending judgment altogether; to the Cynics, “for whom philosophical discourse was reduced to a minimum—sometimes to mere gestures” (WAP 83, 173). Nevertheless, Hadot more typically stresses the commonalities between the ancient philosophical schools and conceptions of philosophy, insofar as each involved “… a complete reversal of received ideas: one was to renounce the false values of wealth, honors, and pleasures, and turn towards the true value of virtue, contemplation, a simple life-style, and the simple happiness of existing”. This radical opposition explains the reaction of nonphilosophers, which ranged from the mockery we find expressed in the comic poets, to the outright hostility that led to the death of Socrates (PWL 104).

c. The Figure of Socrates

It was with the figure of Socrates that ancient philosophy distinguished itself from its ancient precedents: the rhetorical education of the sophists, the discourses of the pre-Socratic physikoi and historians, the sayings and lives of the seven sages, and the aristocratic concern with the paideia, or upbringing, of young men (WAP 9-21). Socrates inspired nearly all subsequent ancient philosophic schools, either directly, through students like Plato, Xenophon, Aristippus, Euclides, and Antisthenes, or indirectly, via the writings of Plato in particular, as a kind of ethical ideal in the Stoic school, and as a mythical, Silenic figure central to the entirety of subsequent Western intellectual life. In Philosophy as a Way of Life, Hadot devotes an entire chapter of WAP to “the figure of Socrates,” as well as a long, beautiful essay exploring Socrates’ atopia (enigmatic nature) and the extraordinary responses his life has inspired, focusing particularly on Kierkegaard and Nietzsche. Hadot’s Socrates anticipates and sets the mold for all the ancient philosophies as ways of life. First, Socrates associated the philosophic life with a revaluation of accepted normative commitments of his society and with a studied indifference toward the things his contemporaries coveted (wealth, status, property, public office, political disputes), as attested by his appearance, dress, and absence of gainful employment (compare Apo. 36b). Second, as Plato’s Alcibiades famously attests in the Symposium, Socrates overturned accepted, inherited models of wisdom, in his discourse as much as in his person, as well as through his repeated ironic claims, that he lacked any kind of higher wisdom, saying that he was only a midwife for the ideas of others, or was like a gadfly stirring his fellows from ethical complacency. He is identified in Plato’s Symposium with the daimonic Eros, mediating between human beings and the gods, but not for that reason divine himself (PWL 158-165).Third, Hadot’s Socrates is the first, unsurpassable practitioner of philosophic dialogue conceived of as what Hadot calls a “spiritual exercise” (compare 5) designed to actively implicate the other in the Socratic process of doubting received opinions and seeking to render one’s own beliefs consistent. For Hadot, “in the Socratic dialogue, the real question is less what is being talked about than who is doing the talking,” as Nikias attests in the Laches, when the latter notes that whichever topic Socrates’ interlocutor may raise, “he will continually be carried round and round by him, until at last he finds that he has to give an account both of his present and past life” (Laches 197e; WAP 28; PWL 155). Fourth, Hadot notes that when Socrates does attest to having some kinds of knowledge, in the famous Socratic paradoxes—that no one does evil voluntarily, that it is better to suffer than to do wrong, and that the good man cannot be harmed—this knowledge is of a specifically ethical kind, concerning how to live, and what is good or bad for the psyche: “Socrates does not know the value to be attributed to death, because it is not in his power . . . Yet he does know the value of moral action and intention, for they do depend on his choice, his decision, and his engagement . . .” (WAP 83, 84). In other words, in Hadot’s Socrates, care for the self and care for others coincided with Socrates’ sense of what Hadot calls “the absolute value of moral intent: a philosophical commitment embodied in Socrates’ dialogical calling, “to try to persuade all of you to concern yourself less about what he has than about what he is . . .” (Apo. 36c). Above all, Hadot stresses that throughout antiquity Socrates was the model of the philosopher whose work was, above all, his own life, death, and example: “He was the first to show that at all times and all places, in everything that happens to us, daily life gives the opportunity to do philosophy” (Plutarch, at WAP 38).

d. The Figure of the Sage

A further, too-often neglected feature of the ancient conception on philosophy as a way of life, Hadot argues, was a set of discourses aiming to describe the figure of the Sage. The Sage was the living embodiment of wisdom, “the highest activity human beings can engage in . . . which is linked intimately to the excellence and virtue of the soul” (WAP 220). Across the schools, Socrates himself was agreed to have been perhaps the only living exemplification of such a figure (his avowed agnoia notwithstanding). Pyrrho and Epicurus were also accorded this elevated status in their respective schools, just as Sextius and Cato were deemed sages by Seneca, and Plotinus by Porphyry. Yet more important than documenting the lives of historical philosophers (although this was another ancient literary genre) was the idea of the Sage as “transcendent norm.” The aim, by picturing such figures, was to give “an idealized description of the specifics of the way of life” that was characteristic of the each of the different schools (WAP 224). The philosophical Sage, in all the ancient discourses, is characterized by a constant inner state of happiness or serenity. This has been achieved through minimizing his bodily and other needs, and thus attaining to the most complete independence (autarcheia) vis-à-vis external things. The Sage is for this reason capable of maintaining virtuous resolve and clarity of judgment in the face of the most overwhelming threats, from natural catastrophes to “the fury of citizens who ordain evil . . . [or] the face of a threatening tyrant” (Horace in WAP 223). In the different ancient schools, these characteristics differentiating the Sage from nonphilosophers mean that this figure “tends to become very close to God or the gods,” as conceived by the philosophers. The Epicurean gods, like the God of Aristotle, Hadot notes, are characterized by their perfect serenity and exemption from all troubles and dangers. Epicurus calls the Sage the friend of the gods, and the gods friends of the Sages. Aristotle equates the contemplation of the wise man with the self-contemplation of the unmoved mover. Platonic philosophy sees ascent in wisdom as progressive assimilation to the divine (WAP 226-7). Hadot goes as far as to suggest that Plotinus and other ancient philosophers “project” the figure of the God, on the basis of their conception of the figure of the Sage, as a kind of model of human and intellectual perfection” (WAP 227-8). However, Hadot stresses that the divine freedom of the Sage from the concerns of ordinary human beings does not mean the Sage lacks all concern for the things that preoccupy other human beings. Indeed, in a series of remarkable analyses, Hadot argues that this indifference towards external goods (money, fame, property, office . . . ) opens the Sage to a different, elevated state of awareness in which he “never ceases to have the whole present in his mind, never forgets the world, thinks and acts in relation to the cosmos . . . ” (Bernhard Groethuysen in WAP 229). The Stoic Sage who has realized that external things do not depend upon his will, for instance, is prompted to accept these “indifferents” with equal benevolence or equanimity (the famous amor fati, or love of fate, later adopted by Nietzsche). In “The Sage and the World,” Hadot analyzes the peculiar phenomenology of this “detached, disinterested consciousness” in Lucretius and Seneca, aligning their thoughts with modern discourse on aesthetic perception, Rousseau’s famous “sensation of existence,” and Bergson’s conception of philosophical perception (PWL 253-6). The perception of the Sage constantly views things with the wonder of seeing the world for the first time (PWL 257-8), or as others see things only when a sense of their mortality, and therefore the unique singularity of each moment and experience, is imposed upon them (PWL 260).

5. Spiritual Practices

a. Askesis of Desire

For Hadot, famously, the means for the philosophical student to achieve the “complete reversal of our usual ways of looking at things” epitomized by the Sage were a series of spiritual exercises. These exercises encompassed all of those practices still associated with philosophical teaching and study: reading, listening, dialogue, inquiry, and research. However, they also included practices deliberately aimed at addressing the student’s larger way of life, and demanding daily or continuous repetition: practices of attention (prosoche), meditations (meletai), memorizations of dogmata, self-mastery (enkrateia), the therapy of the passions, the remembrance of good things, the accomplishment of duties, and the cultivation of indifference towards indifferent things (PWL 84). Hadot acknowledges his use of the term “spiritual exercises” may create anxieties, by associating philosophical practices more closely with religious devotion than typically done (Nussbaum 1996, 353-4; Cooper 2010). Hadot’s use of the adjective “spiritual” (or sometimes “existential”) indeed aims to capture how these practices, like devotional practices in the religious traditions (6a), are aimed at generating and reactivating a constant way of living and perceiving in prokopta, despite the distractions, temptations, and difficulties of life. For this reason, they call upon far more than “reason alone.” They also utilize rhetoric and imagination in order “to formulate the rule of life to ourselves in the most striking and concrete way” and aim to actively re-habituate bodily passions, impulses, and desires (as for instance, in Cynic or Stoic practices, abstinence is used to accustom followers to bear cold, heat, hunger, and other privations) (PWL 85). These practices were used in the ancient schools in the context of specific forms of interpersonal relationships: for example, the relationship between the student and a master, whose role it was to guide and assist the student in the examination of conscience, in identification and rectification of erroneous judgments and bad actions, and in the conduct of dialectical exchanges on established themes.

b. Premeditation of Death and Evils

Perhaps the most well-known philosophical spiritual exercise is the Stoic practice of the premeditation of evils. In this exercise, the students are exhorted to present to their minds, in advance, the possible evils that may befall them in the course of their upcoming endeavors, so as to limit the force of their possible fear, anger, or sadness, should these evils occur. Galen recommends that at the beginning of each day individuals try to call to mind all they have to do in the course of the day ahead, envisaging the ways things may go awry, and recalling the principles that should guide them in their actions; Marcus, similarly, enjoins himself to anticipate each day that he will encounter envious, ungrateful, overbearing, treacherous, and selfish men (Med. II.1) Plato’s Socrates, in the Phaedo, famously comforts his friends by suggesting that philosophy is learning how to die. Taking this Platonic statement as emblematic of a wider philosophical exercise, Hadot stresses that repeated meditation upon one’s mortality, and the possible immanence of one’s death, was a spiritual exercise practiced across the philosophical schools. This exercise was not an exercise in morbidity or life-denial, so much as a means to focus the philosopher’s attention on the “infinite value” of each instant and action in life (5c). In Stoic texts, we read injunctions to “hurry up and live” (Seneca, at WAP 194). Horace’s famous carpe diem from the Odes in like manner reminds us that “Life ebbs as I speak: so seize each day, and grant the next no credit” (PWL 88). As in “practical physics” (5d), meditating upon one’s mortality in such exercises is also prescribed as a way of dying to one’s individuality and passions, so the philosopher learns to look at things from the perspective of universality or objectivity.

c. Concentration on the Present Moment

Constant, renewed attention to the present moment, Hadot argues, “ . . . is, in a sense, the key to spiritual exercises” (PWL 84). The philosophical attempt to focus our attention on present concerns answers to the ontological observation that “we live in the present, so infinitely small. The rest either has been lived, or else it [the future] is uncertain” (Aurelius Med. VII, 54). It also reflects the observation that the pressing, immediate demands of one’s upsetting passions are all responses to concerns about the future (that some feared state will transpire, or some desired state may not) or to concerns about past actions (guilt, shame, or anxiety about how others have perceived one’s words or actions). Yet all that one can ever change or achieve is what is occurring in the present moment, which is the site of all decision, action, and freedom. It would follow that these pathe, or their immediate demands, are tangentially irrational. This is the thought that underlies both the Epicurean prayers of gratitude that nature has made necessary things easy to attain and difficult things easy to bear, and the Stoic teachings concerning the irrationality of the pathē. We must learn to calm our passions so we can clearly assess what is happening to us at any given moment, rectify our present intentions, and accept with equanimity all that is occurring which does not depend upon our volition. The larger aim is that the philosopher learns to separate the self (or in the Stoics, the ruling principle) from all unnecessary attachments to alienable, external goods, so that a sense of joy and gratitude can be experienced independent of whichever situations fate has delivered. As Hadot notes, the Epicurean and Stoic meditations concerning how death is nothing for “us” (since when it is here, “we” are not, and vice-versa) belong here: these meditations are a means to conquer worries about this inevitable future event (WAP 197-8).

d. The View from Above

We saw in 4b how Hadot situates even Aristotle’s apparently purely theoretical endeavors in the context of a choice of bios, one which aims to deliver to the inquirer the great pleasure that attends even the study of physical nature, “for there is something wonderful in all of the works of Nature” (Aristotle at WAP 83). Similarly, Hadot notes, the Epicurean elaboration of a physical philosophy of atoms, an infinite universe, and a plurality of worlds was pursued and recommended by Epicurus as a means to overcome unnecessary fear of death and interventionist gods. The Stoics not only maintained the distinction Hadot generalizes to all ancient philosophy, between philosophy as a way of life and philosophical discourse. Hadot argues that thinkers in this school also maintained that there were “lived” practices of logic, involving the constant examination of one’s practical reasoning and forms of what he terms “practical physics” (WAP 172; PWL 242). Practical physics involved the philosopher’s activity of vigilantly monitoring all his beliefs concerning what he encounters. One practice here was that of dispassionately, analytically dividing enticing or threatening appearances into their matter, form, and parts. In this way, their potentially overpowering impression upon us is combated, as in Marcus’ famous description of sex as “the rubbing together of pieces of gut, followed by the spasmodic secretion of a little bit of slime” (PWL 185). Hadot devotes an entire essay in PWL to the practice of the “view from above,” which he argues was practiced across all of the ancient schools. In this exercise, the students are encouraged to reconsider how small, or ant-like, their lives and actions appear from an enlarged, or cosmic, perspective (the famous perspective sub specie eternis), so as to combat the erroneous significance our self-interest and passions prompt us to assign to particular episodes. In Cicero, as in Boethius (Consolations II 7), for example, the philosopher’s consideration of how his fate is as a tiny speck given the magnitude of the world or of space makes him see the irrationality of the pursuit of fame. Seneca recommends the same exercise to show the folly of pursuing luxuries and of nations’ constant warring (WAP 206-7). The positive side to the exercise is to again engender in students the kind of wonder, serenity, or elevation of spirit, imputed to the perspective of the Sage. In The Veil of Isis, Hadot’s late work on the history of Western conceptions of the natural world, Hadot aligns the attitude engendered by this view from above with the “Orphic” attitude to revealing nature’s secrets through poetry, art, and discourse (VI 155-32). This attitude, pursued in modern philosophy under the rubric of aesthetic perception, is opposed to the “Promethean,” technological attempt to tame nature that is prominent in Baconian science.(VI 101-154).

e. Writing as Hypomnemata, and The Inner Citadel

Hadot’s treatment of Marcus Aurelius’ Ta Eis Eauton (or “Meditations”) in his long essay in PWL, and in the book The Inner Citadel, serves well to bring together both the methodological concerns governing Hadot’s readings of classical thought and this conception of ancient philosophy as revolving around a series of spiritual exercises. The text as we have it is divided into 473 fragments in twelve books, and for all its flashes of limpid beauty, it can seem completely disordered to the modern reader. It has provoked a host of interpretations over time, down to speculations concerning Marcus’ melancholia, stomach ulcer, or morphine addiction. The whole seems to develop no argument and often to repeat itself. The emperor-philosopher mixes genres, or language games, from aphorisms, via staged dialogues and injunctions addressed to himself, to citations from poets and other philosophers, to more extended enthymemes. For Hadot, these formal peculiarities of Marcus’ text dissolve when we situate the text itself as the exemplar of a type of spiritual exercise recommended in the Stoic heritage to which Marcus belonged: namely, as a hypomnemata the philosopher was enjoined to keep always at hand (procheiron), whose production and rereading was recommended as a means for to keep alive at all times the key Stoic principles (kephalaia), independent of whether anyone else should read them. In this perspective, as Hadot concludes The Inner Citadel, the repetitions, the multiple developments of the same theme, and the stylistic effort in the Meditations attest not to any conceptual laziness or other morbidity, rather they suggest “the efforts of a man . . . trying to do what, in the last analysis, we are all trying to do: to live in complete consciousness and lucidity, to give to each of our instants its full intensity, and to give meaning to our entire life” (IC, 312-313).

6. The Transformation of Philosophy after the Decline of Antiquity

a. The Adoption of Spiritual Practices in Monasticism

Hadot disputes the notion of a simple, radical break between Greek philosophy and Judeo-Christian monotheism. Hadot notes that, in the first centuries of the Christian era, educated Christian apologists such as Clement of Alexander, Basil of Caesarea, Origen, Justin, and the other Cappadocian fathers identified Christianity as the true, non-Greek, or “barbarian,” philosophia, much as Philo of Alexandria had presented Judaism as patrios philosophia—the traditional philosophy of the Jewish people (PWL 128-9). Here, Hadot’s attention to the creative role of exegetical errors in the history of ideas applies (see 2). For above all, the Greek word Logos was central to Greek philosophy since Heraclitus, but it was also used by Saint John in the opening verses of the fourth gospel, making possible this conception of Christianity as philosophy (WAP 218-9; PWL 128). Saint John maintained that anticipatory aspects or elements of the true Logos had been dispersed amongst the Greeks. Christians were in possession of the revealed Logos itself in the incarnate Christ. Christianity’s conception as a way of living also positioned it well to appropriate the spiritual exercises developed in the philosophical schools, integrating them into the different “style of life, spiritual attitude and tonality” of Christian life (PWL 129; 139). From the fourth century C. E., monasticism as the perfection of Christian life, in a life withdrawn from ordinary society and devoted to meditation and prayer, adopted what a Cistercian text calls “the disciplines of celestial philosophy” (PWL 129): prosoche or attention to oneself and one’s thoughts, askeseis of the passions, detachment or aprospatheia from worldly concerns, meditation upon key rules of life, the attempt to live each day as if it were one’s last, the practice of writing as hypomnema; all now refigured as the attempt to live in constant remembrance of god. (PWL 129-135) Particularly interesting from a scholarly perspective are Hadot’s observations of the efforts made by Christian authors to ground these practices in biblical exegesis, as for instance in tying philosophical prosoche to biblical text: “Give heed to yourself, lest there be a hidden word in your heart” (Deuteronomy); “Above all else, guard your heart” (Proverbs 4:23); “Examine yourself . . . and test yourselves” (Second Corinthians 13:5); and even the Song of Songs’ “If you do not know yourself, O most beautiful of women . . .” (WAP 248-9; 242; WAP 130).

b. Philosophical Discourse as Handmaiden to Theology and the Natural Sciences

As Hadot notes, another component of the apologists’ attempt to present Christianity in forms congenial to Greco-Roman culture was the attempt to reinterpret elements of Greek philosophical discourse, for instance, the theological passages of the Timaeus, as anticipating revealed doctrine. In another way, the Christian authors would interpret revealed notions in terms redolent of philosophical discourse, as when Evagrius defines “the Kingdom of heaven” as “apatheia of the soul along with true knowledge of existing things” (PWL 136), or in Origen’s recommendation to students to read the Book of Proverbs, Ecclesiastes, and the Song of Songs, as corresponding respectively to philosophical ethics, physics, and theology (WAP 239-240). With the growing cultural ascendancy of revealed Christianity, however, particularly after the closure of the philosophical schools, Hadot argues that philosophy as a way of life was largely eclipsed. Philosophical discourse, for its part, was subordinated within the Christian orbit to the higher wisdom of the Word of God as revealed in the Bible. Elements of Aristotelian logic and ontology, as they had been integrated into the Neoplatonism of the imperial era, were adapted in the Church’s attempts to stabilize the Trinitarian God. Differently, Church fathers like Origen and Clement of Alexandria adopted Philo’s earlier claim that philosophical studies must be conceived as the propaedeutic to the wisdom revealed in the Torah of Moses. By the time of Augustine, philosophy was becoming assimilated in this way with the other secular, mathematical, and dialectical knowledge necessary for the Christian exegete—but in no way sufficient unto itself. The recovery of Aristotle’s writings in the West, and the development of the medieval universities, saw his dialectics adopted as a means for theologians to respond to problems Christian dogma posed to reason, whereas commentary on his dialectical, ethical, and physical writings became the keystone of teaching in the arts faculties. As Hadot comments, “Aristotle” in this way became “Aristotelianism,” and the conception of university philosophy as entirely an exegetical or “scholastic” endeavor was born. It would survive the rise of the natural sciences and the universities’ passing from the Church’s to the secular State’s authority. According to Hadot, there remains a “radical opposition” between the modern, diploma-issuing university, which promotes specific levels of objectified, mostly written forms of knowledge or transferrable skills, and the ancient philosophical school, “which addressed individuals in order to transform their entire personality . . . to train people for their career as human beings . . .” (WAP 260).

c. The Permanence of the Ancient Conception of Philosophy

Nevertheless, Hadot argues that since the Middle Ages, philosophers both within and outside of the universities have kept alive what he terms the “vital, existential dimension” of ancient philosophy (WAP 261). Already in the Middle Ages, scholastic commentators noted the weight of passages in Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics (book X) as pointing toward the theoretical way of life as the culmination of philosophia. Petrarch and Erasmus differently contested that philosophy could be reduced to the commentary on texts, since this in no way makes the scholar better. In a way which contrasts with Michel Foucault’s claims concerning the history of philosophy as a way of life, Hadot sees elements of Stoicism in Descartes’ conception of adequate or comprehensive representation, and his choice to write Meditations; also in Kant’s contrast of the “worldly” “Idea of Philosopher” from the “scholastic” “artists of reason,” and Kant’s central critical notion of the primacy of practical reason. At different points in his oeuvre, Hadot also cites Montaigne, Shaftesbury, Rousseau, Goethe, Thoreau, Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, Merleau-Ponty, and Wittgenstein as legatees to the ancient conception of philosophy as a way of life that it was his own life’s work to try to re-animate.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Works in French

Hadot, P, (with Henry, I.P.). (1960). Marius Victorinus, Traités théologiques sur la Trinité, Cerf 1960 (Sources Chrétiennes nos. 68 &69)
Porphyre et Victorinus. Paris, Institut d’Etudes augustiniennes, 1968. (Collection des études augustiniennes. Série antiquité; 32–33).
Marius Victorinus: recherches sur sa vie et ses oeuvres, 1971. (Collection des études augustiniennes. Série antiquité ; 44).
Exercices spirituels et philosophie antique. Paris, Etudes augustiniennes, 1981. (Collection des études augustiniennes. Série antiquité ; 88).
Hadot, Pierre. (1992). La citadelle intérieure. Introduction aux Pensées de Marc Aurèle. Paris: Fayard.
Hadot, Pierre. (1995). Qu’est-ce que la philosophie antique ? Paris: Gallimard. (Folio essais; 280).
Hadot, Pierre. (1997). Plotin ou la simplicité du regard (4e éd.) Paris: Gallimard. [1e éd. 1963]. (Folio esais; 302).
Etudes de philosophie ancienne. Paris, Les Belles Lettres, 1998. (L’âne d’or ; 8). (recueil d’articles)
Marc Aurèle. Ecrits pour lui même, texte établi et traduit par Pierre Hadot, avec la collaboration de Concetta Luna, vol. 1 (general introduction and Book 1). Paris, Collection Budé, 1998.
Plotin. Porphyre. Études néoplatoniciennes. Paris, Les Belles Lettres, 1999. (L’âne d’or ; 10). (recueil d’articles)
La philosophie comme manière de vivre. Paris, Albin Michel, 2002. (Itinéraires du savoir).
Exercices spirituels et philosophie antique, nouvelle éd. Paris, Albin Michel, 2002. (Bibliothèque de l’évolution de l’humanité).
Le voile d’Isis. Essai sur l’histoire de l’idée de nature. Paris, Gallimard, 2004. (NRF essais).
Wittgenstein et les limites du langage. Paris, J. Vrin, 2004. (Bibliothèque d’histoire de la philosophie).
Apprendre à philosopher dans l’antiquité. L’enseignement du Manuel d’Epictète et son commentaire néoplatonicien (avec Ilsetraut Hadot). Paris, LGF, 2004. (Le livre de poche; 603).

b. Works in English

Hadot, Pierre. (1993). Plotinus, Or the Simplicity of Vision. (Michael Chase, Trans.) Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Hadot, Pierre. (1995). Philosophy as a Way of Life. (Michael Chase, Trans.) Oxford: Blackwell.
Hadot, Pierre. (1998). The Inner Citadel; the Meditations of Marcus Aurelius. Harvard University Press.
Hadot, Pierre. (2002). What is Ancient Philosophy? (Michael Chase, Trans.) Harvard University Press.
Hadot, Pierre. (2006). The Veil of Isis. (Michael Chase, Trans.) Cambridge: Belknap Press.
Hadot, Pierre. (2005). There are Nowadays Professors of Philosophy, But Not Philosophers, The Journal of Speculative Philosophy 19.3, 229-237.
Conversations with Jeannie Carlier and Arnold I. Davidson, trans. Marc Djaballah (Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2009).

c. Selected Articles on Hadot

Chase, Michael. “Remembering Pierre Hadot”, Parts 1 and 2, April 28, 2010, harvardpress.typepad.com/hup_publicity/2010/04/pierre-hadot-part-1.html.
Davidson, Arnold. (Spring 1990). Spiritual Exercises and Ancient Philosophy: An Introduction to Pierre Hadot. Critical Inquiry, 16, 475-482.
Davidson, Arnold. (1995). Introduction: Pierre Hadot and the Spiritual Phenomenon of Ancient Philosophy, in Pierre Hadot, Philosophy as a Way of Life (Michael Chase, Trans.) Oxford: Blackwell.
Donato, Antonio. (2009, September). Review: Pierre Hadot, The Present Alone is Our Happiness: Conversations with Jeannie Carlier and Arnold I. Davidson. Foucault Studies, 7, 164-169.Flynn, Thomas. (2005, September). Philosophy as a Way of Life: Foucault and Hadot. Philosophy & Social Criticism, 31 (5-6), 609-622.
Force, Pierre. (2011, February). The Teeth of Time: Meaning and Misunderstanding in the History of Ideas. History and Theory, 50, 20-40.
Gregor, Bryan. (2011, January). The Text as Mirror: Kierkegaard and Hadot on Transformative Reading. History of Philosophy Quarterly, 28 (1).
Hankey, Wayne. (2003). Philosophy as Way of Life for Christians?: Iamblichan and Porphyrian Reflections on Religion, Virtue, and Philosophy in Thomas Aquinas. Laval théologique et philosophique, 59 (2), 193-224.
Lorenzi, Daniele. “La vie comme “réel” de la philosophie. Cavell, Foucault, Hadot et les techniques de l’ordinaire”, en La voix et la vertu. Variétés du perfectionnisme moral, PUF, Paris 2010, pp. 469-487.
Winkler, Albert Keith. (2002). “Review of Pierre Hadot, What is Ancient Philosophy?” Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 362 pp. xiv.
Zeyl, Donald. (2003). Review: Pierre Hadot, What is Ancient Philosophy? Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews.

Author Information

Matthew Sharpe
Email: matthew.sharpe@deakin.edu.au
Deakin University
Australia

Psychological Egoism

Psychological egoism is the thesis that we are always deep down motivated by what we perceive to be in our own self-interest.Psychological altruism, on the other hand, is the view that sometimes we can have ultimately altruistic motives. Suppose, for example, that Pam saves Jim from a burning office building. What ultimately motivated her to do this? It would be odd to suggest that it’s ultimately her own benefit that Pam is seeking. After all, she’s risking her own life in the process. But the psychological egoist holds that Pam’s apparently altruistic act is ultimately motivated by the goal to benefit herself, whether she is aware of this or not. Pam might have wanted to gain a good feeling from being a hero, or to avoid social reprimand that would follow had she not helped Jim, or something along these lines.

Several other egoistic views are related to, but distinct from psychological egoism. Unlike ethical egoism, psychological egoism is merely an empirical claim about what kinds of motives we have, not what they ought to be. So, while the ethical egoist claims that being self-interested in this way is moral, the psychological egoist merely holds that this is how we are. Similarly, psychological egoism is not identical to what is often called “psychological hedonism.” Psychological hedonism restricts the range of self-interested motivations to only pleasure and the avoidance of pain. Thus, it is a specific version of psychological egoism.

The story of psychological egoism is rather peculiar. Though it is often discussed, it hasn’t been explicitly held by many major figures in the history of philosophy. It is most often attributed to only Thomas Hobbes (1651) and Jeremy Bentham (1781). Most philosophers explicitly reject the view, largely based on famous arguments from Joseph Butler (1726). Nevertheless, psychological egoism can be seen as a background assumption of several other disciplines, such as psychology and economics. Moreover, some biologists have suggested that the thesis can be supported or rejected directly based on evolutionary theory or work in sociobiology.

While psychological egoism is undoubtedly an empirical claim, there hasn’t always been a substantial body of experimental data that bears on the debate. However, a great deal of empirical work beginning in the late 20th century has largely filled the void. Evidence from biology, neuroscience, and psychology has stimulated a lively interdisciplinary dialogue. Regardless of whether or not the empirical evidence renders a decisive verdict on the debate, it has certainly enriched discussion of the issue.

Conceptual Framework for the Debate
Philosophical Arguments For Egoism
Philosophical Arguments Against Egoism
Biology and Egoism
1. Evolutionary vs. Psychological Altruism
2. An Evolutionary Argument Against Egoism
Cognitive Science and Egoism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Conceptual Framework for the Debate

Psychological egoism is a thesis about motivation, usually with a focus on the motivation of human (intentional) action. It is exemplified in the kinds of descriptions we sometimes give of people’s actions in terms of hidden, ulterior motives. A famous story involving Abraham Lincoln usefully illustrates this (see Rachels 2003, p. 69). Lincoln was allegedly arguing that we are all ultimately self-interested when he suddenly stopped to save a group of piglets from drowning. His interlocutor seized the moment, attempting to point out that Lincoln is a living counter-example to his own theory; Lincoln seemed to be concerned with something other than what he took to be his own well-being. But Lincoln reportedly replied: “I should have had no peace of mind all day had I gone on and left that suffering old sow worrying over those pigs. I did it to get peace of mind, don’t you see?”

The psychological egoist holds that descriptions of our motivation, like Lincoln’s, apply to all of us in every instance. The story illustrates that there are many subtle moves for the defender of psychological egoism to make. So it is important to get a clear idea of the competing egoistic versus altruistic theories and of the terms of the debate between them.

a. The Bare Theses

Egoism is often contrasted with altruism. Although the egoism-altruism debate concerns the possibility of altruism in some sense, the ordinary term “altruism” may not track the issue that is of primary interest here. In at least one ordinary use of the term, for someone to act altruistically depends on her being motivated solely by a concern for the welfare of another, without any ulterior motive to simply benefit herself. Altruism here is a feature of the motivation that underlies the action (Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 199). (Another sense of “altruism”—often used in a fairly technical sense in biology—is merely behavioral; see §4a.) To this extent, this ordinary notion of altruism is close to what is of philosophical interest. But there are differences. For instance, ordinarily we seem to only apply the term “altruism” to fairly atypical actions, such as those of great self-sacrifice or heroism. But the debate about psychological egoism concerns the motivations that underlie all of our actions (Nagel 1970/1978, p. 16, n. 1).

Regardless of ordinary terminology, the view philosophers label “psychological egoism” has certain key features. Developing a clear and precise account of the egoism-altruism debate is more difficult than it might seem at first. To make the task easier, we may begin with quite bare and schematic definitions of the positions in the debate (May 2011, p. 27; compare also Rosas 2002, p. 98):

Psychological Egoism: All of our ultimate desires are egoistic.
Psychological Altruism: Some of our ultimate desires are altruistic.

We will use the term “desire” here in a rather broad sense to simply mean a motivational mental state—what we might ordinarily call a “motive” or “reason” in at least one sense of those terms. But what is an “ultimate” desire, and when is it “altruistic” rather than “egoistic”? Answering these and related questions will provide the requisite framework for the debate.

b. Egoistic vs. Altruistic Desires

We can begin to add substance to our bare theses by characterizing what it is to have an altruistic versus an egoistic desire. As some philosophers have pointed out, the psychological egoist claims that all of one’s ultimate desires concern oneself in some sense. However, we must make clear that an egoistic desire exclusively concerns one’s own well-being, benefit, or welfare. A malevolent ultimate desire for the destruction of an enemy does not concern oneself, but it is hardly altruistic (Feinberg 1965/1999, §9, p. 497; Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 229).

Similarly, despite its common use in this context, the term “selfish” is not appropriate here either. The psychological egoist claims that we ultimately only care about (what we consider to be) our own welfare, but this needn’t always amount to selfishness. Consider an ultimate desire to take a nap that is well-deserved and won’t negatively affect anyone. While this concerns one’s own benefit, there is no sense in which it is selfish (Henson 1988, §7; Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 227). The term “self-interest” is more fitting.

With these points in mind, we can characterize egoistic and altruistic desires in the following way:

One’s desire is egoistic if (and only if) it concerns (what one perceives to be) the benefit of oneself and not anyone else.
One’s desire is altruistic if (and only if) it concerns (what one perceives to be) the benefit of at least someone other than oneself.

It’s important that the desire in some sense represents the person as oneself (or, as the case may be, as another). For example, suppose that John wants to help put out a fire in the hair of a man who appears to be in front of him, but he doesn’t know that he’s actually looking into a mirror, and it’s his own hair that’s ablaze. If John’s desire is ultimate and is simply to help the man with his hair in flames, then it is necessary to count his desire as concerning someone other than himself, even though he is in fact the man with his hair on fire (Oldenquist 1980, pp. 27-8; Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 214).

c. Ultimate/Intrinsic Desires

The reason for the focus on ultimate desires is that psychological egoists don’t deny that we often have desires that are altruistic. They do claim, however, that all such altruistic desires ultimately depend on an egoistic desire that is more basic. In other words, we have an ulterior motive when we help others—one that likely tends to fly below the radar of consciousness or introspection.

Thus, we must draw a common philosophical distinction between desires that are for a means to an end and desires for an end in itself. Instrumental desires are those desires one has for something as a means for something else; ultimate desires are those desires one has for something as an end in itself, not as a means to something else (see Sober & Wilson 1998, pp. 217-222). The former are often called “extrinsic desires” and the latter “intrinsic desires” (see e.g. Mele 2003 Ch. 1.8.). Desires for pleasure and the avoidance of pain are paradigmatic ultimate desires, since people often desire these as ends in themselves, not as a mere means to anything else. But the class of ultimate desires may include much more than this.

d. Relating Egoism and Altruism

There are two important aspects to highlight regarding how psychological egoism and altruism relate to one another. First, psychological egoism makes a stronger, universal claim that all of our ultimate desires are egoistic, while psychological altruism merely makes the weaker claim that some of our ultimate desires are altruistic. Thus, the former is a monistic thesis, while the latter is a pluralistic thesis (Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 228). Consequently, psychological egoism is easier to refute than the opposing view. If one were to successfully demonstrate that some—even just one—of a person’s ultimate desires are altruistic, then we can safely reject psychological egoism. For example, if Thomas removes his heel from another’s gouty toe because he has an ultimate desire that the person benefit from it, then psychological egoism is false.

Second, the positions in the debate are not exactly the denial of one another, provided there are desires that are neither altruistic nor egoistic (Stich, Doris, & Roedder 2010, sect. 2). To take an example from Bernard Williams, a “madman” might have an ultimate desire for “a chimpanzees’ tea party to be held in the cathedral” (1973, p. 263). He does not desire this as a means to some other end, such as enjoyment at the sight of such a spectacle (he might, for example, secure this in his will for after his death). Assuming the desire for such a tea party is neither altruistic nor egoistic (because it doesn’t have to do with anyone’s well-being), would it settle the egoism-altruism debate? Not entirely. It would show that psychological egoism is false, since it would demonstrate that some of our ultimate desires are not egoistic. However, it would not show that psychological altruism is true, since it does not show that some of our ultimate desires are altruistic. Likewise, suppose that psychological altruism is false because none of our ultimate desires concern the benefit of others. If that is true, psychological egoism is not thereby true. It too could be false if we sometimes have ultimate desires that are not egoistic, like the madman’s. The point is that the theses are contraries: they cannot both be true, but they can both be false.

2. Philosophical Arguments For Egoism

Philosophers don’t have much sympathy for psychological egoism. Indeed, the only major figures in the history of philosophy to endorse the view explicitly are arguably Thomas Hobbes and Jeremy Bentham. Some might also include Aristotle (compare Feinberg 1965/1999, p. 501) and John Stuart Mill (compare Sidgwick 1874/1907, 1.4.2.1), but there is some room for interpreting them otherwise. Hobbes explicitly states in Leviathan (1651/1991):

…no man giveth but with intention of good to himself, because gift is voluntary; and of all voluntary acts, the object is to every man his own good; of which, if men see they shall be frustrated, there will be no beginning of benevolence or trust, nor consequently of mutual help. (Ch. XV, p. 47)

In a similar vein, Bentham famously opens his Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation (1781/1991) with this:

Nature has placed mankind under the governance of two sovereign masters, pain and pleasure. It is for them alone to point out what we ought to do, as well as to determine what we shall do. On the one hand the standard of right and wrong, on the other the chain of causes and effects, are fastened to their throne. (p. 313)

Here Bentham appears to endorse a specific version of psychological egoism, namely psychological hedonism. This view restricts the kind of self-interest we can ultimately desire to pleasure or the avoidance of pain. Unfortunately, Hobbes and Bentham don’t offer much in the way of arguments for these views; they tend to just assume them.

a. Desire Ownership

One tempting argument for psychological egoism is based on what seem to be conceptual truths about (intentional) action. For example, many hold that all of one’s actions are motivated by one’s own desires. This might seem to directly support psychological egoism because it shows that we are all out to satisfy our own desires (compare Hobbes). In his famous Fifteen Sermons, Bishop Butler (1726/1991) anticipates such an argument for the universality of egoistic desires (or “self-love”) in the following manner:

[B]ecause every particular affection is a man’s own, and the pleasure arising from its gratification his own pleasure, or pleasure to himself, such particular affection must be called self-love; according to this way of speaking, no creature whatever can possibly act but merely from self-love. (Sermon XI, p. 366)

However, as Butler goes on to say, this line of argument rests on a mistake or at least a play on words. Many philosophers have subsequently reinforced Butler’s objection, often pointing to two intertwined confusions: one based on our desires being ours, another based on equivocation on the word “satisfaction.” On the former confusion, C. D. Broad says “it is true that all impulses belong to a self” but “it is not true that the object of any of them is the general happiness of the self who owns them” (1930/2000, p. 65).

Similarly, the second confusion fails to distinguish between what Bernard Williams calls “desiring the satisfaction of one’s desire” and “desiring one’s own satisfaction” (1973, p. 261). The word “satisfaction” in the latter case is the more ordinary use involving one’s own pleasure or happiness. If all actions are motivated by a desire for this, then psychological egoism is indeed established. But the basic consideration from the theory of action we began with was merely that all actions are motivated by a desire of one’s own, which is meant to be satisfied. However, this employs a different notion of satisfaction, which merely means that the person got what she wanted (Feinberg 1965/1999, p. 496). The claim that everyone is out to satisfy their own desires is a fairly uninteresting one, since it doesn’t show that we are motivated by self-interest. If Mother Teresa did have an altruistic desire for the benefit of another, it is no count against her that she sought to satisfy it—that is, bring about the benefit of another. This argument for psychological egoism, then, seems to rely on an obviously false view of self-interest as desire-satisfaction.

b. Simplicity and Parsimony

A major theoretical attraction of psychological egoism is parsimony. It provides a simple account of human motivation and offers a unified explanation of all our actions. Although actions may vary in content, the ultimate source is self-interest: doing well at one’s job is merely to gain the favor of one’s boss; returning a wallet is merely to avoid the pang of guilt that would follow keeping it; saying “thank you” for a meal is merely to avoid social reprimand for failing to conform to etiquette; and so on.

One might dispute whether psychological egoism is any more parsimonious than psychological altruism (Sober & Wilson 1998, pp. 292-3). More importantly, however, it is no argument for a view that it is simpler than its competitors. Perhaps we might employ Ockham’s Razor as a sort of tie-breaker to adjudicate between two theories when they are equal in all other respects, but this involves more than just simplicity (Sober & Wilson 1998, pp. 293-5). As David Hume puts it, psychological egoism shouldn’t be based solely on “that love of simplicity which has been the source of much false reasoning in philosophy” (1751/1998, p. 166). The heart of the debate then is whether there are other reasons to prefer one view over the other.

c. Moral Education

Perhaps the psychological egoist needn’t appeal to parsimony or erroneous conceptions of self-interest. Bentham, after all, suggests that ordinary experience shows that we are ultimately motivated to gain pleasure or avoid pain (1781/1991, Ch. 3). Perhaps one could extrapolate an argument on behalf of psychological egoism along the following lines (Feinberg 1965/1999, sect. 4, p. 495). Experience shows that people must be taught to care for others with carrots and sticks—with reward and punishment. So seemingly altruistic ultimate desires are merely instrumental to egoistic ones; we come to believe that we must be concerned with the interests of others in order to gain rewards and avoid punishment for ourselves (compare the argument in §5a).

This line of reasoning is rather difficult to evaluate given that it rests on an empirical claim about moral development and learning. Ordinary experience does show that sometimes it’s necessary to impose sanctions on children for them to be nice and caring. But even if this occurs often, it doesn’t support a universal claim that it always does. Moreover, there is a growing body of evidence gathered by developmental psychologists indicating that young children have a natural, unlearned concern for others. There is some evidence, for example, that children as young as 14-months will spontaneously help a person they believe is in need (Warneken & Tomasello 2007). It seems implausible that children have learned at such a young age that this behavior will be benefit themselves. On the other hand, such empirical results do not necessarily show that the ultimate motivation behind such action is altruistic. The psychological egoist could argue that we still possess ultimately egoistic desires (perhaps we are simply born believing that concern for others will benefit oneself). However, the developmental evidence still undermines the moral education argument by indicating that our concern for the welfare others is not universally learned from birth by sanctions of reward and punishment.

d. Self-Other Merging

Another argument for psychological egoism relies on the idea that we often blur our conception of ourselves and others when we are benevolent. Consider the paradigm of apparently selfless motivation: concern for family, especially one’s children. Francis Hutcheson anticipates the objection when he imagines a psychological egoist proclaiming: “Children are not only made of our bodies, but resemble us in body and mind; they are rational agents as we are, and we only love our own likeness in them” (1725/1991, p. 279, Raphael sect. 327). And this might seem to be supported by recent empirical research. After all, social psychologists have discovered that we tend to feel more empathy for others we perceive to be in need when they are similar to us in various respects and when we take on their perspective (Batson 1991; see §5b). In fact, some psychologists have endorsed precisely this sort of self-other merging argument for an egoistic view (for example, Cialdini, Brown, Lewis, Luce, and Neuberg 1997).

One might doubt, however, whether a self-other merging account is able to explain helping behavior in an egoistic way. For example, it would be quite implausible to say that we literally believe we exist in two different bodies when feeling empathy for someone. The most credible reading of the proposal is that we conceptually blur the distinction between ourselves and others in the relevant cases. Yet this would seem to require, contrary to fact, that our behavior reflects this blurring. If we think of the boundary between ourselves and another as indeterminate, presumably our helping behavior would reflect such indeterminacy. (For further discussion, see Hutcheson 1725/1991, pp. 279-80; Batson 2011, ch. 6; May 2011.)

3. Philosophical Arguments Against Egoism

Considering the arguments, the case for psychological egoism seems rather weak. But is there anything to be said directly against it? This section examines some of the most famous arguments philosophers have proposed against the view.

a. Butler’s Stone: Presupposition & Byproducts

Bishop Joseph Butler provides a famous argument against psychological egoism (focusing on hedonism) in his Fifteen Sermons. The key passage is the following:

That all particular appetites and passions are towards external things themselves, distinct from the pleasure arising from them, is manifested from hence; that there could not be this pleasure, were it not for that prior suitableness between the object and the passion: there could be no enjoyment or delight from one thing more than another, from eating food more than from swallowing a stone, if there were not an affection or appetite to one thing more than another. (1726/1991, Sermon XI, p. 365)

Many philosophers have championed this argument, which Elliott Sober and David Sloan Wilson (1998) have dubbed “Butler’s stone.” Broad (1930/2000), for example, writes that Butler “killed the theory [of psychological egoism] so thoroughly that he sometimes seems to the modern reader to be flogging dead horses” (p. 55).

Butler’s idea is that the experience of pleasure upon attaining something presupposes (or at least strongly indicates) a desire for the thing attained, not the pleasure itself. After all, we typically do not experience pleasure upon getting something (like food) unless we want it. The pleasure that accompanies the fulfillment of our desires is often a mere byproduct of our prior desire for the thing that gave us pleasure. Often we feel pleasure upon getting what we want precisely because we wanted what gave us pleasure. For example, getting second place in a race would make a runner happy only if she wants to place in the top three. She would be disappointed if she only cares to win first place.

While Butler’s version of the argument may be overly ambitious in various respects (Sidgwick 1874/1907, 1.4.2.3; Sober and Wilson 1998, p. 278), the best version is probably something like the following (compare the “disinterested benevolence” argument in Feinberg 1965/1999, §c8):

Sometimes people benefit from helping others (e.g. experience pleasure).
Sometimes such benefit presupposes a desire for what generated it (e.g. food), not for the resulting benefit.
So sometimes people desire things other than self-interest.
Therefore: Psychological egoism is false.

The basic idea is that pleasure (or self-interest generally) can’t be our universal concern because having it sometimes presupposes a desire for something other than pleasure itself. Many philosophers have endorsed this sort of argument, not only against hedonism but more generally against egoism (Hume 1751/1998, App. 2.12; Broad 1950/1952; Nagel 1970/1978, p. 80, n. 1; Feinberg 1965/1999).

Sober and Wilson, however, make the case that such arguments are seriously flawed at least because “the conclusion does not follow from the premises” (1998, p. 278). That is, the premises, even if true, fail to establish the conclusion. The main problem is that such arguments tell us nothing about which desires are ultimate. Even if the experience of pleasure sometimes presupposes a desire for the pleasurable object, it is still left open whether the desire for what generated the pleasure is merely instrumental to a desire for pleasure (or some other form of self-interest). Consider the following causal chain, using “→” to mean “caused” (see Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 278):

Desire for food → Eating → Pleasure

According to Butler, the experience of pleasure upon eating some food allows us to infer the existence of a desire for food. This is all the argument gets us. Yet Butler’s opponent, the egoist, maintains that the desire for food is subsequent to and dependent on an ultimate desire for pleasure (or some other form of self-interest):

Ultimate desire for pleasure → Desire for food → Eating → Pleasure

This egoistic picture is entirely compatible with Butler’s claims about presupposition. So, even if the premises are true, it does not follow that egoism is false.

Butler would need a stronger premise, such as: pleasure presupposes an ultimate desire for what generated it, not for the resulting benefit. But this revision would plausibly make the argument question-begging. The new premise seems to amount to nothing more than the denial of psychological egoism: sometimes people have an ultimate desire for something other than self-interest. At the very least, the argument is dialectically unhelpful—it offers premises in support of the conclusion that are as controversial as the conclusion is, and for similar reasons.

Still, a general lesson can clearly be gained from arguments like Butler’s. Psychological egoists cannot establish their view simply by pointing to the pleasure or self-benefit that accompanies so many actions. After all, often self-benefit only seems to be what we ultimately desire, though a closer look reveals benefits like pleasure are likely just byproducts while the proximate desire is for that which generates them. As Hume puts it, sometimes “we are impelled immediately to seek particular objects, such as fame or power, or vengeance without any regard to interest; and when these objects are attained a pleasing enjoyment ensues, as the consequence of our indulged affections” (1751/1998, App. 2.12, emphasis added). Perhaps Butler’s point is best seen as a formidable objection to a certain kind of argument for egoism, rather than a positive argument against the theory.

b. Introspection and Common Sense

A simple argument against psychological egoism is that it seems obviously false. As Francis Hutcheson proclaims: “An honest farmer will tell you, that he studies the preservation and happiness of his children, and loves them without any design of good to himself” (1725/1991, p. 277, Raphael sect. 327). Likewise, Hume rhetorically asks, “What interest can a fond mother have in view, who loses her health by assiduous attendance on her sick child, and afterwards languishes and dies of grief, when freed, by its death, from the slavery of that attendance?” (1751/1998, App. 2.9, p. 167). Building on this observation, Hume takes the “most obvious objection” to psychological egoism to be that:

…as it is contrary to common feeling and our most unprejudiced notions, there is required the highest stretch of philosophy to establish so extraordinary a paradox. To the most careless observer there appear to be such dispositions as benevolence and generosity; such affections as love, friendship, compassion, gratitude. […] And as this is the obvious appearance of things, it must be admitted, till some hypothesis be discovered, which by penetrating deeper into human nature, may prove the former affections to be nothing but modifications of the latter. (1751/1998, App. 2.6, p. 166)

Here Hume is offering a burden-shifting argument. The idea is that psychological egoism is implausible on its face, offering strained accounts of apparently altruistic actions. So the burden of proof is on the egoist to show us why we should believe the view; yet the attempts so far have “hitherto proved fruitless,” according to Hume (1751/1998, App. 2.6, p. 166). Similarly, C. D. Broad (1950/1952) and Bernard Williams (1973, pp. 262-3) consider various examples of actions that seem implausible to characterize as ultimately motivated by self-interest.

Given the arguments, it is still unclear why we should consider psychological egoism to be obviously untrue. One might appeal to introspection or common sense; but neither is particularly powerful. First, the consensus among psychologists is that a great number of our mental states, even our motives, are not accessible to consciousness or cannot reliably be reported on through the use of introspection (see, for example, Nisbett and Wilson 1977). While introspection, to some extent, may be a decent source of knowledge of our own minds, it is fairly suspect to reject an empirical claim about potentially unconscious motivations. Besides, one might report universally egoistic motives based on introspection (e.g. Mercer 2001, pp. 229-30). Second, shifting the burden of proof based on common sense is rather limited. Sober and Wilson (1998, p. 288) go so far as to say that we have “no business taking common sense at face value” in the context of an empirical hypothesis. Even if we disagree with their claim and allow a larger role for shifting burdens of proof via common sense, it still may have limited use, especially when the common sense view might be reasonably cast as supporting either position in the egoism-altruism debate. Here, instead of appeals to common sense, it would be of greater use to employ more secure philosophical arguments and rigorous empirical evidence.

c. Unfalsifiability

Another popular complaint about psychological egoism is that it seems to be immune to empirical refutation; it is “unfalsifiable.” And this is often taken to be a criterion for an empirical theory: any view that isn’t falsifiable isn’t a genuine, credible scientific theory (see Karl Popper’s Falsificationism). The worry for psychological egoism is that it will fail to meet this criterion if any commonly accepted altruistic action can be explained away as motivated by some sort of self-interest. Joel Feinberg, for example, writes:

Until we know what they [psychological egoists] would count as unselfish behavior, we can’t very well know what they mean when they say that all voluntary behavior is selfish. And at this point we may suspect that they are holding their theory in a “privileged position”—that of immunity to evidence, that they would allow no conceivable behavior to count as evidence against it. What they say then, if true, must be true in virtue of the way they define—or redefine—the word “selfish.” And in that case, it cannot be an empirical hypothesis. (1965/1999, §18, p. 503; see also §§14-19)

As we have seen (§1b), psychological egoism needn’t hold that all our ultimate desires are selfish. But Feinberg’s point is that we need to know what would count as empirical evidence against the existence of an egoistic ultimate desire.

This objection to psychological egoism has three substantial problems. First, falsification criteria for empirical theories are problematic and have come under heavy attack. In addition it’s unclear why we should think the view is false. Perhaps it is a bad scientific theory or a view we shouldn’t care much about, but it is not thereby false. Second, any problems that afflict psychological egoism on this front will also apply to the opposing view (Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 290). After all, psychological altruism is a pluralistic thesis that includes both egoistic and altruistic motives. Third, and most importantly, a charitable construal of psychological egoism renders it falsifiable. As we have seen, psychological egoists have a clear account of what would falsify it: an ultimate desire that is not egoistic. While it may be difficult to detect the ultimate motives of people, the view is in principle falsifiable. In fact, it is empirically testable, as we shall see below.

d. The Paradox of Egoism

Another popular objection to various forms of psychological egoism is often called “the paradox of hedonism,” which was primarily popularized by Henry Sidgwick (1874/1907, 2.3.2.3). It is usually directed at psychological hedonism, but the problem can be extended to psychological egoism generally.

When the target is only hedonism, the “paradox” is that we tend to attain more pleasure by focusing on things other than pleasure. Likewise, when directed at egoism generally, the idea is that we will tend not to benefit ourselves by focusing on our own benefit. Consider someone, Jones, who is ultimately concerned with his own well-being, not the interests of others (the example is adapted from Feinberg 1965/1999, p. 498, sect. 11). Two things will seemingly hold: (a) such a person would eventually lack friends, close relationships, etc. and (b) this will lead to much unhappiness. This seems problematic for a theory that says all of our ultimate desires are for our own well-being.

Despite its popularity, this sort of objection to psychological egoism is quite questionable. There are several worries about the premises of the argument, such as the claim that ultimate concern for oneself diminishes one’s own well-being (see Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 280). Most importantly, the paradox is only potentially an issue for a version of egoism that prescribes ultimate concern for oneself, such as normative egoism (Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 280). The futility of ultimate concern for oneself can only undermine claims such as “We should only ultimately care about our own well-being” since this allegedly would not lead to happiness. But psychological egoism is a descriptive thesis. Even if egoistic ultimate desires lead to unhappiness, that would only show that egoistically motivated people will find this unfortunate.

4. Biology and Egoism

Despite its widespread rejection among philosophers, philosophical arguments against psychological egoism aren’t overwhelmingly powerful. However, the theses in this debate are ultimately empirical claims about human motivation. So we can also look to more empirical disciplines, such as biology and psychology, to advance the debate. Biology in particular contains an abundance of literature on altruism. But, as we will see, much of it is rather tangential to the thesis of psychological altruism.

a. Evolutionary vs. Psychological Altruism

The ordinary (psychological) sense of “altruism” is different from altruism as discussed in biology. For example, sociobiologists, such as E. O. Wilson, often theorize about the biological basis of altruism by focusing on the behavior of non-human animals. But this is altruism only in the sense of helpful behavior that seems to be at some cost to the helper. It says nothing about the motivations for such behavior, which is of interest to us here. Similarly, “altruism” is a label commonly used in a technical sense as a problem for evolutionary theory (see Altruism and Group Selection). What we might separately label evolutionary altruism occurs whenever an organism “reduces its own fitness and augments the fitness of others” regardless of the motivation behind it (Sober & Wilson 1998, p. 199). Distinguishing the psychological sense of “altruism” from other uses of the term is crucial if we are to look to biology to contribute to the debate on ultimate desires.

Given the multiple uses of terms, discussion of altruism and self-interest in evolutionary theory can often seem directly relevant to the psychological egoism-altruism debate. One might think, for example, that basic facts about evolution show we’re motivated by self-interest. Consider our desires for water, food, or sex. We have these drives perhaps solely because they enhanced the evolutionary fitness of our ancestors, by helping them stay alive and thus to propagate their genes. And evolutionary theory plausibly uncovers this sort of gene-centered story for many features of organisms. Richard Dawkins offers us some ideas of this sort. Although he emphasizes that the term “selfish,” as he applies it to genes, is merely metaphorical, he says “we have the power to defy the selfish genes of our birth… let us try to teach generosity and altruism because we are born selfish (1976/2006, p. 3).

But we should be careful not to let the self-centered origin of our traits overshadow the traits themselves. Even if all of our desires are due to evolutionary adaptations (which is a strong claim), this is only their cause, not their content. Consider again the desire for water. It might exist only because it can help propagate one’s genes, but the desire is still for water, not to propagate one’s genes (compare the Genetic Fallacy). William James makes a similar point with an example of a ship that travels the ocean by burning coal: the fuel is a cause of the voyage but not its purpose (James 1890: 558, cited in Feinberg 1965/1999, sect. 6).

As Simon Blackburn points out, “Dawkins is following a long tradition in implying that biology carries simple messages for understanding the sociology and psychology of human beings” (1998, p. 146). To be fair, in a later edition of The Selfish Gene, Dawkins recognizes his folly and asks the reader to ignore such “rogue” sentences (p. ix). In any event, we must avoid what Blackburn polemically calls the “biologist’s fallacy” of “inferring the ‘true’ psychology of the person from the fact that his or her genes have proved good at replicating over time” (p. 147). We must avoid simple leaps from biology to psychology without substantial argument (see also Stich et al. 2010, sect. 3).

b. An Evolutionary Argument Against Egoism

Philosopher Elliott Sober and biologist David Sloan Wilson (1998) have made careful and sophisticated arguments for the falsity of psychological egoism directly from considerations in evolutionary biology. Their contention is the following: “‘Natural selection is unlikely to have given us purely egoistic motives” (p. 12). To establish this, they focus on parental care, an other-regarding behavior in humans, whose mechanism is plausibly due to natural selection. Assuming such behavior is mediated by what the organism believes and desires, we can inquire into the kinds of mental mechanisms that could have evolved. The crucial question becomes: Is it more likely that such a mechanism for parental care would, as psychological egoism holds, involve only egoistic ultimate desires? To answer this question, Sober and Wilson focus on just one version of egoism, and what they take to be the most difficult to refute: psychological hedonism (p. 297). The hedonistic mechanism always begins with the ultimate desire for pleasure and the avoidance of pain. The mechanism consistent with psychological altruism, however, is pluralistic: some ultimate desires are hedonistic, but others are altruistic.

According to Sober and Wilson, there are three main factors that could affect the likelihood that a mechanism evolved: availability, reliability, and energetic efficiency (pp. 305-8). First, the genes that give rise to the mechanism must be available in the pool for selection. Second, the mechanism mustn’t conflict with the organism’s reproductive fitness; they must reliably produce the relevant fitness-enhancing outcome (such as viability of offspring). And third, they must do this efficiently, without yielding a significant cost to the organism’s own fitness-enhancing resources. Sober and Wilson find no reason to believe that a hedonistic mechanism would be more or less available or energetically efficient. The key difference, they contend, is reliability: “Pluralism was just as available as hedonism, it was more reliable, and hedonism provides no advantage in terms of energetic efficiency” (p. 323).

Sober and Wilson make several arguments for the claim that the pluralistic mechanism is more reliable. But one key disadvantage of a hedonistic mechanism, they argue, is that it’s heavily “mediated by beliefs” (p. 314). For example, in order to produce parental care given the ultimate desire for pleasure, one must believe that helping one’s child will provide one with sufficient pleasure over competing alternative courses of action:

(Ultimate) Desire for Pleasure → Believe Helping Provides Most Pleasure → Desire to Help…

Moreover, such beliefs must be true, otherwise it’s likely the instrumental desire to help will eventually extinguish, and then the fitness-enhancing outcome of parental care won’t occur. The pluralistic model, however, is comparatively less complicated since it can just deploy an ultimate desire to help:

(Ultimate) Desire to Help…

Since the pluralistic mechanism doesn’t rely on as many beliefs, it is less susceptible to lack of available evidence for maintaining them. So yielding the fitness-enhancing outcome of parental care will be less vulnerable to disruption. Sober and Wilson (p. 314) liken the hedonistic mechanism to a Rube Goldberg machine, partly because it accomplishes its goal through overly complex means. Each link in the chain is susceptible to error, which makes the mechanism less reliable at yielding the relevant outcome.

Such arguments have not gone undisputed (see, for example, Stich et al. 2010, sect. 3). Yet they still provide a sophisticated way to connect evolutionary considerations with psychological egoism. In the next section we’ll consider more direct ways for addressing the egoism-altruism debate empirically.

5. Cognitive Science and Egoism

Psychological egoism is an empirical claim; however, considerations from biology provide only one route to addressing the egoism-altruism debate empirically. Another, perhaps more direct, approach is to examine empirical work on the mind itself.

a. Behavioristic Learning Theory

In the 20th century, one of the earliest philosophical discussions of egoism as it relates to research in psychology comes from Michael Slote (1964). He argues that there is at least potentially a basis for psychological egoism in behavioristic theories of learning, championed especially by psychologists such as B. F. Skinner. Slote writes that such theories “posit a certain number of basically ‘selfish,’ unlearned primary drives or motives (like hunger, thirst, sleep, elimination, and sex), and explain all other, higher-order drives or motives as derived genetically from the primary ones via certain ‘laws of reinforcement’” (p. 530). This theory importantly makes the additional claim that the “higher-order” motives, including altruistic ones, are not “functionally autonomous.” That is, they are merely instrumental to (“functionally dependent” on) the egoistic ultimate desires. According to Slote, the basic support for functional dependence is the following: If “we cut off all reinforcement of [the instrumental desire] by primary rewards (rewards of primary [egoistic] drives),” then the altruistic desire “actually does extinguish” (p. 531). Thus, all altruistic desires are merely instrumental to ultimately egoistic ones; we have merely learned through conditioning that benefiting others benefits ourselves. That, according to Slote, is what the behavioristic learning theory maintains.

Like the moral education argument, Slote’s is vulnerable to work in developmental psychology indicating that some prosocial behavior is not conditioned (see §2c). Moreover, behavioristic approaches throughout psychology have been widely rejected in the wake of the “cognitive revolution.” Learning theorists now recognize mechanisms that go quite beyond the tools of behaviorism (beyond mere classical and operant conditioning). Slote does only claim to have established the following highly qualified thesis: “It would seem, then, that, as psychology stands today, there is at least some reason to think that the psychological theory we have been discussing may be true” (p. 537); and he appears to reject psychological egoism in his later work. In any event, more recent empirical research is more apt and informative to this debate.

b. Neuroscience

Philosopher Carolyn Morillo (1990) has defended a version of psychological hedonism based on more recent neuroscientific work primarily done on rats. Morillo argues for a “strongly monistic” theory of motivation that is grounded in “internal reward events,” which holds that “we [ultimately] desire these reward events because we find them to be intrinsically satisfying” (p. 173). The support for her claim is primarily evidence that the “reward center” of the brain, which is the spring of motivation, is the same as the “pleasure center,” which indicates that the basic reward driving action is pleasure.

Morillo admits though that the idea is “highly speculative” and based on “empirical straws in the wind.” Furthermore, philosopher Timothy Schroeder (2004) argues that later work in neuroscience casts serious doubt on the identification of the reward event with pleasure. In short, by manipulating rats’ brains, neuroscientist Kent Berridge and colleagues have provided substantial evidence that being motivated to get something is entirely separable from “liking” it (that is, from its generating pleasure). Against Morillo, Schroeder concludes that the data are better explained by the hypothesis that the reward center of the brain “can indirectly activate the pleasure center than by the hypothesis that either is such a center” (p. 81, emphasis added; see also Schroeder, Roskies, and Nichols 2010, pp. 105-6.)

c. Social Psychology

Other empirical work that bears on the existence of altruistic motives can be found in the study of empathy-induced helping behavior. Beginning around the 1980s, C. Daniel Batson and other social psychologists addressed the debate head on by examining such phenomena. Batson (1991; 2011), in particular, argues that the experiments conducted provide evidence for an altruistic model, the empathy-altruism hypothesis, which holds that as “empathic feeling for a person in need increases, altruistic motivation to have that person’s need relieved increases” (1991, p. 72). In other words, the hypothesis states that empathy tends to induce in us ultimate desires for the well-being of someone other than ourselves. If true, this entails that psychological egoism is false.

Batson comes to this conclusion by concentrating on a robust effect of empathy on helping behavior discovered in the 1970s. The empathy-helping relationship is the finding that the experience of relatively high empathy for another perceived to be in need causes people to help the other more than relatively low empathy. However, as Batson recognizes, this doesn’t establish psychological altruism, because it doesn’t specify whether the ultimate desire is altruistic or egoistic. Given that there can be both egoistic and altruistic explanations of the empathy-helping relationship, Batson and others have devised experiments to test them.

The general experimental approach involves placing ordinary people in situations in which they have an opportunity to help someone they think is in need while manipulating other variables in the situation. The purpose is to provide circumstances in which egoistic versus altruistic explanations of empathy-induced helping behavior make different predictions about what people will do. Different hypotheses then provide either egoistic or altruistic explanations of why the subjects ultimately chose to help or offer to help. (For detailed discussions of the background assumptions involved here, see Batson 1991, pp. 64-67; Sober & Wilson 1998, Ch. 6; Stich, Doris, and Roedder 2010.)

Several egoistic explanations of the empathy-helping relationship are in competition with the empathy-altruism hypothesis. Each one claims that experiences of relatively high empathy (“empathic arousal”) causes subjects to help simply because it induces an egoistic ultimate desire; the desire to help the other is solely instrumental to the ultimate desire to benefit oneself. However, the experiments seem to rule out all the plausible (and some rather implausible) egoistic explanations. For example, if those feeling higher amounts of empathy help only because they want to reduce the discomfort of the situation, then they should help less frequently when they know their task is over and they can simply leave the experiment without helping. Yet this prediction has been repeatedly disconfirmed (Batson 1991, ch. 8). A host of experiments have similarly disconfirmed a range of egoistic hypotheses. The cumulative results evidently show that the empathy-helping relationship is not put in place by egoistic ultimate desires to either:

relieve personal distress (e.g. discomfort from the situation),
avoid self-punishment (e.g. feelings of guilt),
avoid social-punishment (e.g. looking bad to others),
obtain rewards from self or others (e.g. praise, pride),
gain a mood-enhancing experience (e.g. feel glad someone was helped).

Furthermore, according to Batson, the data all conform to the empathy-altruism hypothesis, which claims that empathic arousal induces an ultimate desire for the person in need to be helped (see Batson 1991; for a relatively brief review, see Batson & Shaw 1991).

Some have argued against Batson that there are plausible egoistic explanations not ruled out by the data collected thus far (e.g. Cialdini et al. 1997; Sober & Wilson 1998, Ch. 8; Stich, Doris, and Roedder 2010). However, many egoistic explanations have been tested along similar lines and appear to be disconfirmed. While Batson admits that more studies can and should be done on this topic, he ultimately concludes that we are at least tentatively justified in believing that the empathy-altruism hypothesis is true. Thus, he contends that psychological egoism is false: “Contrary to the beliefs of Hobbes, La Rochefoucauld, Mandeville, and virtually all psychologists, altruistic concern for the welfare of others is within the human repertoire” (1991, p. 174).

6. Conclusion

It seems philosophical arguments against psychological egoism aren’t quite as powerful as we might expect given the widespread rejection of the theory among philosophers. So the theory is arguably more difficult to refute than many have tended to suppose. It is important to keep in mind, however, that the theory makes a rather strong, universal claim that all of our ultimate desires are egoistic, making it easy to cast doubt on such a view given that it takes only one counter-example to refute it.

Another important conclusion is that empirical work can contribute to the egoism-altruism debate. There is now a wealth of data emerging in various disciplines that addresses this fascinating and important debate about the nature of human motivation. While some have argued that the jury is still out, it is clear that the rising interdisciplinary dialogue is both welcome and constructive. Perhaps with the philosophical and empirical arguments taken together we can declare substantial progress.

7. References and Further Reading

Batson, C. D. (1991). The Altruism Question: Toward a Social-Psychological Answer. Hillsdale, NJ: Lawrence Erlbaum Associates.
- Batson’s first book-length defense of the existence of altruism. Examines a wide range of empirical data from social psychology for the empathy-altruism hypothesis.
Batson, C. D. (2011). Altruism in Humans. New York: Oxford University Press.
- An updated book-length defense of the existence of altruism in humans. Attempts to rebut challenges to the empathy-altruism hypothesis based on experiments done since the early 1990s.
Batson, C. D & L. L. Shaw (1991). “Evidence for Altruism: Toward a Pluralism of Prosocial Motives.” Psychological Inquiry Vol. 2, No. 2, pp. 107–122.
- An overview of the experimental evidence for altruism. Examines the experimental evidence for the empathy-altruism hypothesis more briefly than Batson’s book.
Bentham, Jeremy (1781/1991). Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Reprinted in part in Raphael (1991), Vol. II, pp. 313–346.
- Bentham’s famous treatise defending utilitarianism. One of his basic assumptions about human psychology is psychological hedonism.
Blackburn, Simon (1998). Ruling Passions. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- A broadly Humean account of motivation and ethics that covers, among others things, some issues at the intersection of egoism and biology (see ch. 5).
Broad, C. D. (1930/2000). Five Types of Ethical Theory. Reprinted in 2000, London: Routledge. (Originally published in 1930 by Kegan Paul, Trench, Trubner & Co. Ltd.)
- A discussion of the ethical theories of Spinoza, Butler, Hume, Kant, and Sidgwick. Broad champions Butler’s arguments against psychological egoism, saying Butler thoroughly “killed the theory.”
Broad, C. D. (1950/1952). “Egoism as a Theory of Human Motives.” The Hibbert Journal Vol. 48, pp. 105–114. (Reprinted in his Ethics and the History of Philosophy: Selected Essays, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1952.)
- Broad’s famous discussion of psychological egoism in which he provides a rich framework for the debate. He develops what takes to be the most plausible version of psychological egoism, but concludes that it is rather implausible.
Butler, Joseph (1726/1991). Fifteen Sermons Preached at the Rolls Chapel. Reprinted in part in Raphael (1991), Vol. I, pp. 325–377. (Originally published by Hilliard and Brown in Cambridge; Hilliard, Gray, Little, and Wilkins in Boston.)
- Butler’s famous text discussing, among other things, psychological egoism and hedonism, though not under those labels. He mounts a famous argument against psychological hedonism in particular.
Cialdini, Robert B., S. L. Brown, B. P. Lewis, C. Luce, & S. L. Neuberg (1997). “Reinterpreting the Empathy-Altruism Relationship: When One Into One Equals Oneness” Journal of Personality and Social Psychology 73 (3): 481-494.
- A widely cited criticism of Batson’s empathy-altruism hypothesis. The authors present empirical evidence that empathy tends to induce ultimately egoistic, not altruistic, motives by blurring one’s distinction between oneself and the other for whom empathy is felt.
Dawkins, Richard (1976/2006). The Selfish Gene. 30th anniversary edition with new introduction, New York: Oxford University Press, 2006. (Originally published in 1976.)
- Famous account of the process of evolution, turning the focus on genes, rather than the organism, and their propensity to replicate themselves via natural selection (hence the idea of a “selfish” gene).
Feinberg, Joel (1965/1999). “Psychological Egoism.” In Joel Feinberg & Russ Shafer-Landau (eds.), Reason and Responsibility, 10th ed. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 1999. (Originally published in 1965 by Dickenson Pub. Co., based on materials composed for philosophy students at Brown University in 1958.)
- A comprehensive discussion of philosophical arguments for and against psychological egoism. Rejects psychological egoism based primarily on traditional philosophical arguments.
Henson, Richard G. (1988). “Butler on Selfishness and Self-Love.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research Vol. 49, No. 1, pp. 31–57.
- An examination of Butler’s arguments against psychological egoism as they relate to selfishness. Henson importantly argues that the “self-love” crucial to egoism is not equivalent to selfishness.
Hobbes, Thomas (1651/1991). Leviathan. Reprinted in part in Raphael (1991) Vol. I, pp. 18–60.
- The classic treatise on moral and political philosophy grounded in what is often considered a grim view of human nature. A classic interpretation is that Hobbes holds a form of psychological egoism.
Hume, David (1751/1998). “Of Self-Love.” Appendix II of his An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, Tom L. Beauchamp (ed.), Oxford University Press.
- A discussion of psychological egoism that is absent from the Treatise. Largely endorses Butler’s arguments against psychological egoism while offering some original considerations against it as well.
Hutcheson, Francis (1725/1991). An Inquiry into the Original of our Ideas of Beauty and Virtue. Reprinted in part in Raphael (1991), Vol. I, pp. 260–321. (First printed in 1725.)
- Argues against psychological egoism in a variety of ways, most notably by attempting to reveal how implausible it is on its face once its commitments are made clear. See especially Treatise II, An Inquiry Concerning the Original of Our Ideas of Virtue or Moral Good.
James, William (1890). The Principles of Psychology, Vol. 2. New York: Henry Holt.
May, Joshua (2011). “Egoism, Empathy, and Self-Other Merging.” Southern Journal of Philosophy Vol. 49, Spindel Supplment: Empathy and Ethics, Remy Debes (ed.), pp. 25-39.
- A critique of arguments for psychological egoism that appeal to the idea that we blur the distinction between ourselves and others, especially when we feel empathy for them.
Mele, Alfred (2003). Motivation and Agency. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Discusses a wide range of philosophical topics related to motivation. Although egoism isn’t covered, ch. 1 provides a rich conceptual framework for discussing motivation in a broad range of contexts, such as a taxonomy of various desires.
Mercer, Mark. (2001). “In Defence of Weak Psychological Egoism.” Erkenntnis Vol. 55, No. 2, pp. 217–237.
- A recent defense of a form of psychological egoism that appeals to introspection and the purported unintelligibility of altruistic explanations of actions.
Morillo, Carolyn (1990). “The Reward Event and Motivation.” The Journal of Philosophy Vol. 87, No. 4, pp. 169–186.
- A recent defense of a kind of psychological hedonism based on work in neuroscience, especially experiments on rats and their “pleasure centers.”
Nagel, Thomas (1970/1978). The Possibility of Altruism. Princeton University Press. (Originally published in 1970, Oxford: Clarendon Press.)
- A famous discussion of altruism and related topics. Focus, however, is not just to rebut egoistic theories of motivation but also neo-Humean desire-based ones, which are related more to the distinct debate about the role of “reason” in motivation.
Nisbett, R. E. & T. D. Wilson (1977). “Telling More Than We Can Know: Verbal Reports on Mental Processes.” Psychological Review Vol. 84, No. 3, pp. 231–259.
- A classic empirical investigation into the reliability and nature of introspective reports on one’s own mental states. Doubt is cast on the extent to which we have direct introspective access to higher-order cognitive processes.
Oldenquist, Andrew (1980). “The Possibility of Selfishness.” American Philosophical Quarterly Vol. 17, No. 1, pp. 25–33.
- Argues that the natural state of humans is altruistic rather than egoistic. Emphasizes the importance of representations of oneself as oneself or as “I” in egoistic desires.
Rachels, James. (2003). The Elements of Moral Philosophy, 4^th ed. McGraw-Hill. (First published in 1986.)
- A popular contemporary introduction to moral philosophy. Ch. 5 contains a detailed discussion of psychological egoism. Like most philosophers, declares psychological egoism bankrupt based on the standard sorts of philosophical objections to it.
Raphael, D. D. (ed.) (1991). British Moralists: 1650-1800, 2 Vols. Indianapolis, Indiana: Hackett.
- A two-volume collection of the moral and political writings of British philosophers from around the 17^th Century, including Hobbes, Butler, Hume, and Bentham.
Rosas, Alejandro (2002). “Psychological and Evolutionary Evidence for Altruism.” Biology and Philosophy Vol. 17, No. 1, pp. 93–107.
- A critique of Sober and Wilson’s claim that evolutionary theory resolves the egoism-altruism debate while social psychology doesn’t. Rosas argues that they should treat both similarly given the folk psychological framework they both employ.
Sidgwick, Henry (1874/1907). The Methods of Ethics, 7^th ed. Indianapolis: Hackett Publish Company. (Reprinted in 1981 from the printing by Macmillan and Co., Ltd. First edition published in 1874.)
- A classic, comprehensive ethical theory, which focuses on developing a kind of utilitarianism. A significant portion of it is devoted to various kinds of egoism. But he pretty clearly rejects psychological egoism, which is arguably contrary to several of his utilitarian predecessors.
Schroeder, Timothy (2004). Three Faces of Desire. New York: Oxford University Press.
- A philosopher’s defense of a reward-based theory of desire that is grounded in empirical work largely from neuroscience. Schroeder argues that pleasure-based theories, like Morillo’s, are not supported by recent findings, which undermines her empirical basis for psychological hedonism.
Schroeder, Timothy, Adina Roskies, & Shaun Nichols (2010). “Moral Motivation.” The Moral Psychology Handbook, John Doris & The Moral Psychology Research Group (eds.). Oxford University Press, pp. 72-110.
- An examination of the neurological basis of moral motivation in the brain. Psychological hedonism is addressed briefly at the end.
Slote, Michael A. (1964). “An Empirical Basis for Psychological Egoism.” Journal of Philosophy Vol. 61, No. 18, pp. 530–537.
- A philosopher’s defense of psychological egoism based on empirical work in psychology at the time, which was largely behavioristic in nature.
Sober, Elliott & D. S. Wilson (1998). Unto Others: The Evolution and Psychology of Unselfish Behavior. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- A widely celebrated and influential book by a philosopher and biologist containing a sustained examination of the biological, psychological, and philosophical arguments for and against psychological egoism. They argue that philosophical arguments and Batson’s work in social psychology do not provide sufficient evidence either way, whereas evolutionary theory does, based on a group selection model.
Stich, Stephen, John M. Doris, & Erica Roedder (2010). “Altruism.” The Moral Psychology Handbook, John M. Doris and the Moral Psychology Research Group (eds.). Oxford University Press, pp. 147–205.
- An overview of the philosophical, evolutionary, and psychological work relevant to the egoism-altruism debate. Focuses primarily on Sober and Wilson as well as Batson, arguing that psychological evidence has advanced the debate more than evolutionary arguments, though both are currently inconclusive.
Williams, Bernard (1973). “Egoism and Altruism.” Ch. 15 in Problems of the Self: Philosophical Papers 1956-1972, Cambridge University Press, pp. 250–265.
- A discussion of egoism and altruism as related both to ethical theory and moral psychology. Williams considers and rejects various arguments for and against the existence of egoistic motives and the rationality of someone motivated by self-interest. He ultimately attempts to give a more Humean defense of altruism, as opposed to the more Kantian defenses found in Thomas Nagel, for example.
Warneken, Felix & Michael Tomasello (2007). “Helping and Cooperation at 14 Months of Age.” Infancy Vol. 11, No. 3, pp. 271–294.
- Gathers empirical evidence about the prosocial behavior of young children—in particular that they will spontaneously help others who appear to be in need.

Author Information

Joshua May
Email: joshmay@uab.edu
University of Alabama at Birmingham
U. S. A.

Aristotle: Logic

Aristotelian logic, after a great and early triumph, consolidated its position of influence to rule over the philosophical world throughout the Middle Ages up until the 19^th Century. All that changed in a hurry when modern logicians embraced a new kind of mathematical logic and pushed out what they regarded as the antiquated and clunky method of syllogisms. Although Aristotle’s very rich and expansive account of logic differs in key ways from modern approaches, it is more than a historical curiosity. It provides an alternative way of approaching logic and continues to provide critical insights into contemporary issues and concerns. The main thrust of this article is to explain Aristotle’s logical system as a whole while correcting some prominent misconceptions that persist in the popular understanding and even in some of the specialized literature. Before getting down to business, it is important to point out that Aristotle is a synoptic thinker with an over-arching theory that ties together all aspects and fields of philosophy. He does not view logic as a separate, self-sufficient subject-matter, to be considered in isolation from other aspects of disciplined inquiry. Although we cannot consider all the details of his encyclopedic approach, we can sketch out the larger picture in a way that illuminates the general thrust of his system. For the purposes of this entry, let us define logic as that field of inquiry which investigates how we reason correctly (and, by extension, how we reason incorrectly). Aristotle does not believe that the purpose of logic is to prove that human beings can have knowledge. (He dismisses excessive scepticism.) The aim of logic is the elaboration of a coherent system that allows us to investigate, classify, and evaluate good and bad forms of reasoning.

The Organon
Categories
From Words into Propositions
Kinds of Propositions
Square of Opposition
Laws of Thought
Existential Assumptions
Form versus Content
The Syllogism
Inductive Syllogism
Deduction versus Induction
Science
Non-Discursive Reasoning
Rhetoric
Fallacies
Moral Reasoning
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. The Organon

To those used to the silver tones of an accomplished writer like Plato, Aristotle’s prose will seem, at first glance, a difficult read. What we have are largely notes, written at various points in his career, for different purposes, edited and cobbled together by later followers. The style of the resulting collection is often rambling, repetitious, obscure, and disjointed. There are many arcane, puzzling, and perhaps contradictory passages. This problem is compounded by the abstract, technical vocabulary logic sometimes requires and by the wide-ranging scope and the scattered nature of Aristotle’s observations. Some familiarity with Greek terminology is required if one hopes to capture the nuances in his thought. Classicists and scholars do argue, of course, about the precise Greek meaning of key words or phrases but many of these debates involve minor points of interpretation that cannot concern us here. Aristotle’s logical vocabulary needs to be understood within the larger context of his system as a whole. Many good translations of Aristotle are available. (Parenthetical citations below include the approximate Bekker number (the scholarly notation for referring to Aristotelian passages according to page, column, and line number of a standard edition), the English title of the work, and the name of the translator.)

Ancient commentators regarded logic as a widely-applicable instrument or method for careful thinking. They grouped Aristotle’s six logical treatises into a sort of manual they called the Organon (Greek for “tool”). The Organon included the Categories, On Interpretation, the Prior Analytics, the Posterior Analytics, the Topics, and On Sophistical Refutations. These books touch on many issues: the logical structure of propositions, the proper structure of arguments (syllogisms), the difference between induction and deduction, the nature of scientific knowledge, basic fallacies (forms of specious reasoning), debating techniques, and so on. But we cannot confine our present investigations to the Organon. Aristotle comments on the principle of non-contradiction in the Metaphysics, on less rigorous forms of argument in the Rhetoric, on the intellectual virtues in the Nicomachean Ethics, on the difference between truth and falsity in On the Soul, and so on. We cannot overlook such important passages if we wish to gain an adequate understanding of Aristotelian logic.

2. Categories

The world, as Aristotle describes it in his Categories, is composed of substances—separate, individual things—to which various characterizations or properties can be ascribed. Each substance is a unified whole composed of interlocking parts. There are two kinds of substances. A primary substance is (in the simplest instance) an independent (or detachable) object, composed of matter, characterized by form. Individual living organisms—a man, a rainbow trout, an oak tree—provide the most unambiguous examples of primary substances. Secondary substances are the larger groups, the species or genera, to which these individual organisms belong. So man, horse, mammals, animals (and so on) would be examples of secondary substances. As we shall see, Aristotle’s logic is about correctly attributing specific properties to secondary substances (and therefore, indirectly, about attributing these properties to primary substances or individual things).

Aristotle elaborates a logic that is designed to describe what exists in the world. We may well wonder then, how many different ways can we describe something? In his Categories (4.1b25-2a4), Aristotle enumerates ten different ways of describing something. These categories (Greek=kategoria, deriving from the verb to indicate, signify) include (1) substance, (2) quantity, (3) quality, (4) relation, (5) where, (6) when, (7) being-in-a-position, (8) possessing, (9) doing or (10) undergoing something or being affected by something. In the Topics (I.9, 103b20-25), he includes the same list, replacing “substance” (ousia) with “essence” (ti esti). We can, along with Aristotle, give an example of each kind of description: (1) to designate something as a “horse” or a “man” is to identify it as a substance or to attribute an essence to it; (2) to say that the wall is four feet long is to describe it in terms of quantity; (3) to say that the roof is “white” is to ascribe a quality to it; (4) to say that your weight is “double” mine is to describe a relation between the two; (5) to say something happened in the market-place is to explain where; (6) to say it happened last year is to explain when; (7) to say an old man is sitting is to describe his position; (8) to say the girl has shoes on is to describe what she possesses; (9) to say the head chef is cutting a carrot with a knife is to describe what he is doing; and finally, (10) to say wood is being burned in the fireplace is to describe what it means for the wood to undergo burning or to be affected by fire. Commentators claim that these ten categories represent either different descriptions of being or different kinds of being. (To be a substance is to be in a certain way; to possess quantity is to be in a certain way; to possess a quality is to be in a certain way, and so on.) There is nothing magical about the number ten. Aristotle gives shorter lists elsewhere. (Compare Posterior Analytics, I.22.83a22-24, where he lists seven predications, for example). Whether Aristotle intends the longer lists as a complete enumeration of all conceivable types of descriptions is an open question. Scholars have noticed that the first category, substance or essence, seems to be fundamentally different than the others; it is what something is in the most complete and perfect way.

3. From Words into Propositions

Aristotle does not believe that all reasoning deals with words. (Moral decision-making is, for Aristotle, a form of reasoning that can occur without words.) Still, words are a good place to begin our study of his logic. Logic, as we now understand it, chiefly has to do with how we evaluate arguments. But arguments are made of statements, which are, in turn, made of words. In Aristotelian logic, the most basic statement is a proposition, a complete sentence that asserts something. (There are other kinds of sentences—prayers, questions, commands—that do not assert anything true or false about the world and which, therefore, exist outside the purview of logic.) A proposition is ideally composed of at least three words: a subject (a word naming a substance), a predicate (a word naming a property), and a connecting verb, what logicians call a copula (Latin, for “bond” or “connection”). Consider the simple statement: “Socrates is wise.” Socrates is the subject; the property of being wise is the predicate, and the verb “is” (the copula) links Socrates and wisdom together in a single affirmation. We can express all this symbolically as “S is P” where “S” stands for the subject “Socrates” and “P” stands for the predicate “being wise.” The sentence “Socrates is wise” (or symbolically, “S is P”) qualifies as a proposition; it is a statement that claims that something is true about the world. Paradigmatically, the subject would be a (secondary) substance (a natural division of primary substances) and the predicate would be a necessary or essential property as in: “birds are feathered,” or “triangles have interior angles equal to two right angles,” or “fire is upward-moving.” But any overly restrictive metaphysical idea about what terms in a proposition mean seems to unnecessarily restrict intelligent discourse. Suppose someone were to claim that “anger is unethical.” But anger is not a substance; it is a property of a substance (an organism). Still, it makes perfect sense to predicate properties of anger. We can say that anger is unethical, hard to control, an excess of passion, familiar enough, and so on. Aristotle himself exhibits some flexibility here. Still, there is something to Aristotle’s view that the closer a proposition is to the metaphysical structure of the world, the more it counts as knowledge. Aristotle has an all-embracing view of logic and yet believes that, what we could call “metaphysical correctness” produces a more rigorous, scientific form of logical expression.

Of course, it is not enough to produce propositions; what we are after is true propositions. Aristotle believes that only propositions are true or false. Truth or falsity (at least with respect to linguistic expression) is a matter of combining words into complete propositions that purport to assert something about the world. Individual words or incomplete phrases, considered by themselves, are neither true or false. To say, “Socrates,” or “jumping up and down,” or “brilliant red” is not to assert anything true or false about the world. It is to repeat words without making any claim about the way things are. In the Metaphysics, Aristotle provides his own definition of true and false: “to say of what is that it is, and of what is not that it is not, is true”; and “to say of what is that it is not, or of what is not that it is, is false.” (IV.7.1011b25, Ross.) In other words, a true proposition corresponds to way things are. But Aristotle is not proposing a correspondence theory of truth as an expert would understand it. He is operating at a more basic level. Consider the statement: “Spiders have eight legs.” (Symbolically, “All S is P,” where S, the subject, is “spiders”; P, the predicate, is “the state of being eight-legged,” and the verb “is” functions as the copula.) What does it mean to say that this claim is true? If we observe spiders to discover how many legs they have, we will find that (except in a few odd cases) spiders do have eight legs, so the proposition will be true because what it says matches reality. As we shall see, Aristotle’s logic is designed to produce just this kind of general statement.

4. Kinds of Propositions

Aristotle suggests that all propositions must either affirm or deny something. Every proposition must be either an affirmation or a negation; it cannot be both. He also points out that propositions can make claims about what necessarily is the case, about what possibly is the case, or even about what is impossible. His modal logic, which deals with these further qualifications about possibility or necessity, presents difficulties of interpretation. We will focus on his assertoric (or non-modal) logic here. Still, many of Aristotle’s points about necessity and possibility seem highly intuitive. In one famous example about a hypothetical sea battle, he observes that the necessary truth of a mere proposition does not trump the uncertainty of future events. Because it is necessarily true that there will be or will not be a sea battle tomorrow, we cannot conclude that either alternative is necessarily true. (De Interpretatione, 9.19a30ff.) So the necessity that attaches to the proposition “there will or will not be a sea battle tomorrow” does not transfer over to the claim ‘that there will be a sea battle tomorrow” or to the claim “there will not be a sea battle tomorrow.” Aristotle goes out of his way to emphasize the point that our personal beliefs about what will happen in the future do not determine whether the individual propositions are true. (Note that we must not confuse the necessary truth of a proposition with the necessity that precipitates the conclusion of a deductively-valid argument. The former is sometimes called “material,” “non-logical,” or “metaphysical” necessity; the later, “formal,” “deductive,” or “logical” necessity.” We discuss these issues further below.)

Aristotle claims that all propositions can be expressed using the “Subject copula Predicate” formula and that complex propositions are, on closer inspection, collections of simpler claims that display, in turn, this fundamental structure. Having fixed the proper logical form of a proposition, he goes on to classify different kinds of propositions. He begins by distinguishing between particular terms and universal terms. (The term he uses for “universal” is the Greek “katholou.”) Particular terms refer to individual things; universal terms refer to groups of things. The name “Socrates” is a particular term because it refers to a single human being; the word “spiders” is a universal term for it universally applies to all members of the group “spiders.” Aristotle realizes, of course, that universal terms may be used to refer to parts of a group as well as to entire groups. We may claim that all spiders have eight legs or that only some spiders have book-lungs. In the first case, a property, eight-leggedness, is predicated of the entire group referred to by the universal term; in the second case, the property of having book-lungs is predicated of only part of the group. So, to use Aristotelian language, one may predicate a property universally or not universally of the group referred to by a universal term.

This brings us to Aristotle’s classification of the four different kinds of categorical propositions (called “categorical propositions” because they assert a relationship between two categories or kinds). Each different categorical proposition possesses quantity insomuch as it represents a universal or a particular predication (referring to all or only some members of the subject class). It also possesses a definite quality (positive or negative) insomuch as it affirms or denies the specified predication. The adjectives “all,” “no,” and “some” (which is understood as meaning “at least one”) determine the quantity of the proposition; the quality is determined by whether the verb is in the affirmative or the negative. Rather than going into the details of Aristotle’s original texts, suffice it to say that contemporary logicians generally distinguish between four logical possibilities:

1. Universal Affirmation: All S are P (called A statements from the Latin, “AFFIRMO”: I affirm).

2. Universal Negation: No S are P (called E statements from “NEGO”: I deny).

3. Particular Affirmation: Some S are P (called I statements from AFFIRMO).

4. Particular Negation: Some S are not P (called O statements from NEGO).

Note that these four possibilities are not, in every instance, mutually exclusive. As mentioned above, particular statements using the modifier “some” refer to at least one member of a group. To say that “some S are P” is to say that “at least one S is P”; to say that “some S are not P” is to say that “at least one S is not P.” It must follow then (at least on Aristotle’s system) that universal statements require the corresponding particular statement. If “All S are P,” at least one S must be P; that is, the particular statement “Some S are P” must be true. Again, if “No S are P,” at least one S must not be P; that is, the particular statement “Some S are not P” must be true. (More on this, with qualifications, below.) Note also that Aristotle treats propositions with an individual subject such as “Socrates is wise” as universal propositions (as if the proposition was saying something like “all instances of Socrates” are wise.) One caveat: Although we cannot linger on further complications here, keep in mind that this is not the only way to divide up logical possibility.

5. Square of Opposition

Aristotle examines the way in which these four different categorical propositions are related to one another. His views have come down to us as “the square of opposition,” a mnemonic diagram that captures, systematizes, and slightly extends what Aristotle says in De Interpretatione. (Cf. 6.17a25ff.)

Figure 1

The Traditional Square of Opposition

As it turns out, we can use a square with crossed interior diagonals (Fig. 1 above) to identify four kinds of relationships that hold between different pairs of categorical propositions. Consider each relationship in turn.

1) Contradictory propositions possess opposite truth-values. In the diagram, they are linked by a diagonal line. If one of two contradictories is true, the other must be false, and vice versa. So the A proposition (All S are P) and the O proposition (Some S are not P) are contradictories. Clearly, if it is true that “all S are P,” then the O statement that “some S are not P” must be false. And if it is true that “some S are not P,” then the A statement that “all S are P” must be false. The same relationship holds between E (No S are P) and I (Some S are P) propositions. To use a simple example: If it is true that “all birds lay eggs,” then it must be false that “some birds do not lay eggs.” And if it is true that “some birds do not fly,” then it must be false that “all birds fly.”

2) Contrary propositions cannot both be true. The top horizontal line in the square joining the A proposition (All S are P) to the E proposition (No S are P) represents this logical relationship. Clearly, it cannot be true that “all S are P” and that “no S are P.” The truth of one of these contrary propositions excludes the truth of the other. It is possible, however, that both statements are false as in the case where some S are P and some (other) S are not P. So, for example, the statements “all politicians tell lies” and “no politicians tell lies” cannot both be true. They will, however, both be false if it is indeed the case that some politicians tell lies whereas some do not.

3) The relationship of subalternation results when the truth of a universal proposition, “the superaltern,” requires the truth of a second particular proposition, “the subaltern.” The vertical lines moving downward from the top to the bottom of the square in the diagram represent this condition. Clearly, if all members of an existent group possess (or do not possess) a specific characteristic, it must follow that any smaller subset of that group must possess (or not possess) that specific characteristic. If the A proposition (All S are P) is true, it must follow that the I proposition (“Some S are P”) must be true. Again, if the E proposition (No S are P) is true, it must follow that the O proposition (Some S are not P) must be true. Consider, for example, the statement, “all cheetahs are fast.” If every member of the whole group of cheetahs is fast, then it must be the case that at least one member of the group of cheetahs is fast; that is, the statement “some cheetahs are fast” must be true. And, to reformulate the same example as a negation, if it is true that “no cheetahs are slow,” then it must be the case that at least one member of the group of cheetahs is not slow; that is, the statement “some cheetahs are not slow” must be true.

Note that subalternation does not work in the opposite direction. If “Some S are P,” it need not follow that “All S are P.” And if “Some S are not P,” it need not follow that “No S are P.” We should also point out that if the subaltern is false, it must follow that the superaltern is false. If it is false to say that “Some S are P,” it must be false to say that “All S are P.” And if it is false to say that “Some S are not P,” it must be false to say that “No S are P.”

4) Subcontrary propositions cannot both be false. The bottom horizontal line in the square joining the I proposition (Some S are P) to the O proposition (Some S are not P) represents this kind of subcontrary relationship. Keeping to the assumptions implicit in Aristotle’s system, there are only three possibilities: (1) All S have property P; in which case, it must also be true (by subalternation) that “some S are P.” (2) No S have property P; in which case it must also be true (by subalternation) that “some S are not P.” (3) Some S have and some S do not have property P; in which case it will be true that “some S are P” and that “some S are not P.” It follows that at least one of a pair of subcontrary propositions must be true and that both will be true in cases where P is partially predicated of S. So, for example, both members of the subcontrary pair “some men have beards” and “some men do not have beards” are true. They are both true because having a beard is a contingent or variable male attribute. In contrast, only one member of the subcontrary pair “some snakes are legless” and “some snakes are not legless” is true. As all snakes are legless, the proposition “some snakes are not legless” must be false.

Traditional logicians, inspired by Aristotle’s wide-ranging comments, identified a series of “immediate inferences” as a way of deriving new propositions through a routine rearrangement of terms. Subalternation is an obvious example of immediate inference. From “All S are P” we can immediately infer—that is, without argument—that “some S are P.” They also recognized conversion, obversion, and contraposition as immediate inferences.

In conversion, one interchanges the S and P terms. If, for example, we know that “No S is P,” we can immediately infer that “No P is S.” (Once we know that “no circles are triangles,” we know right away that “no triangles are circles.”)

In obversion, one negates the predicate term while replacing it with the predicate term of opposite quality. If, for example, we know that “Some S are P,” we can immediately infer the obverse, “Some S are not non-P.” (Once we know that “some students are happy,” we know right away that “some students are not unhappy.”)

Finally, in contraposition, one negates both terms and reverses their order. If, for example, we know that “All S are P,” we can infer the contrapositive “All non-P are non-S.” (Once we know that “all voters are adults,” we know right away that “all children are unable to vote.”) More specific rules, restrictions, and details are readily available elsewhere.

6. Laws of Thought

During the 18th, 19th, and early 20th Century, scholars who saw themselves as carrying on the Aristotelian and Medieval tradition in logic, often pointed to the “laws of thought” as the basis of all logic. One still encounters this approach in textbook accounts of informal logic. The usual list of logical laws (or logical first principles) includes three axioms: the law of identity, the law of non-contradiction, and the law of excluded middle. (Some authors include a law of sufficient reason, that every event or claim must have a sufficient reason or explanation, and so forth.) It would be a gross simplification to argue that these ideas derive exclusively from Aristotle or to suggest (as some authors seem to imply) that he self-consciously presented a theory uniquely derived from these three laws. The idea is rather that Aristotle’s theory presupposes these principles and/or that he discusses or alludes to them somewhere in his work. Traditional logicians did not regard them as abstruse or esoteric doctrines but as manifestly obvious principles that require assent for logical discourse to be possible.

The law of identity could be summarized as the patently unremarkable but seemingly inescapable notion that things must be, of course, identical with themselves. Expressed symbolically: “A is A,” where A is an individual, a species, or a genus. Although Aristotle never explicitly enunciates this law, he does observe, in the Metaphysics, that “the fact that a thing is itself is [the only] answer to all such questions as why the man is man, or the musician musical.” (VII.17.1041a16-18, Ross.) This suggests that he does accept, unsurprisingly, the perfectly obvious idea that things are themselves. If, however, identical things must possess identical attributes, this opens the door to various logical maneuvers. One can, for example, substitute equivalent terms for one another and, even more portentously, one can arrive at some conception of analogy and induction. Aristotle writes, “all water is said to be . . . the same as all water . . . because of a certain likeness.” (Topics, I.7.103a19-20, Pickard-Cambridge.) If water is water, then by the law of identity, anything we discover to be water must possess the same water-properties.

Aristotle provides several formulations of the law of non-contradiction, the idea that logically correct propositions cannot affirm and deny the same thing:

“It is impossible for anyone to believe the same thing to be and not be.” (Metaphysics, IV.3.1005b23-24, Ross.)

“The same attribute cannot at the same time belong and not belong to the same subject in the same respect.” (Ibid., IV.3.1005b19-20.)

“The most indisputable of all beliefs is that contradictory statements are not at the same time true.” (Ibid., IV.6.1011b13-14.)

Symbolically, the law of non-contradiction is sometimes represented as “not (A and not A).”

The law of excluded middle can be summarized as the idea that every proposition must be either true or false, not both and not neither. In Aristotle’s words, “It is necessary for the affirmation or the negation to be true or false.” (De Interpretatione, 9.18a28-29, Ackrill.) Symbolically, we can represent the law of excluded middle as an exclusive disjunction: “A is true or A is false,” where only one alternative holds. Because every proposition must be true or false, it does not follow, of course, that we can know if a particular proposition is true or false.

Despite perennial challenges to these so-called laws (by intuitionists, dialetheists, and others), Aristotelians inevitably claim that such counterarguments hinge on some unresolved ambiguity (equivocation), on a conflation of what we know with what is actually the case, on a false or static account of identity, or on some other failure to fully grasp the implications of what one is saying.

7. Existential Assumptions

Before we move on to consider Aristotle’s account of the syllogism, we need to clear up some widespread misconceptions and explain a few things about Aristotle’s project as a whole. Criticisms of Aristotle’s logic often assume that what Aristotle was trying to do coincides with the basic project of modern logic. Begin with the usual criticism brought against the traditional square of opposition. For reasons we will not explore, modern logicians assume that universal claims about non-existent objects (or empty sets) are true but that particular claims about them are false. On this reading, the claim that “all fairy-god mothers are beautiful” is true, whereas the claim that “some fairy-god mothers are beautiful” is false. Clearly, this clashes with the traditional square of opposition. By simple subalternation, the truth of the proposition “all fairy-god mothers are beautiful” requires the truth of the proposition “some fairy-god mothers are beautiful.” If the first claim is true, the second claim must also be true. For this and similar reasons, some modern logicians dismiss the traditional square as inadequate, claiming that Aristotle made a mistake or overlooked relevant issues. Aristotle, however, is involved in a specialized project. He elaborates an alternative logic, specifically adapted to the problems he is trying to solve.

Aristotle devises a companion-logic for science. He relegates fictions like fairy godmothers and mermaids and unicorns to the realms of poetry and literature. In his mind, they exist outside the ambit of science. This is why he leaves no room for such non-existent entities in his logic. This is a thoughtful choice, not an inadvertent omission. Technically, Aristotelian science is a search for definitions, where a definition is “a phrase signifying a thing’s essence.” (Topics, I.5.102a37, Pickard-Cambridge.) To possess an essence—is literally to possess a “what-it-is-to-be” something (to ti ēn einai). Because non-existent entities cannot be anything, they do not, in Aristotle’s mind, possess an essence. They cannot be defined. Aristotle makes this point explicitly in the Posterior Analytics. He points out that a definition of a goat-stag, a cross between a goat and a deer (the ancient equivalent of a unicorn), is impossible. He writes, “no one knows the nature of what does not exist—[we] can know the meaning of the phrase or name ‘goat-stag’ but not what the essential nature of a goat-stag is.” (II.7.92b6-8, Mure.) Because we cannot know what the essential nature of a goat-stag is—indeed, it has no essential nature—we cannot provide a proper definition of a goat-stag. So the study of goat-stags (or unicorns) is not open to scientific investigation. Aristotle sets about designing a logic that is intended to display relations between scientific propositions, where science is understood as a search for essential definitions. This is why he leaves no place for fictional entities like goat-stags (or unicorns). Hence, the assumed validity of a logical maneuver like subalternation.

8. Form versus Content

However, this is not the only way Aristotle’s approach parts ways with more modern assumptions. Some modern logicians might define logic as that philosophical inquiry which considers the form not the content of propositions. Aristotle’s logic is unapologetically metaphysical. We cannot properly understand what Aristotle is about by separating form from content. Suppose, for example, I was to claim that (1) all birds have feathers and (2) that everyone in the Tremblay family wears a red hat. These two claims possess the same very same propositional form, A. We can represent the first claim as: “All S are P,” where S=birds, and P=being feathered. And we can also represent the second claim as “All S are P,” where S=members of the Tremblay family, and P=wearing a red hat. Considered from an Aristotelian point of view, however, these two “All S are P” propositions possess a very different logical status. Aristotle would view the relationship between birds and feathers expressed in the first proposition as a necessary link, for it is of the essence of birds to be feathered. Something cannot be a bird and lack feathers. The link between membership in the Tremblay family and the practice of wearing a red hat described in the second proposition is, in sharp contrast, a contingent fact about the world. A member of the Tremblay family who wore a green hat would still be a member of the Tremblay family. The fact that the Tremblays only wear red hats (because it is presently the fashion in Quebec) is an accidental (or surface) feature of what a Tremblay is. So this second relationship holds in a much weaker sense. In Aristotle’s mind, this has important consequences not just for metaphysics, but for logic.

It is hard to capture in modern English the underlying metaphysical force in Aristotle’s categorical statements. In the Prior Analytics Aristotle renders the phrase “S is P” as “P belongs to S.” The sense of belonging here is crucial. Aristotle wants a logic that tells us what belongs to what. But there are different levels of belonging. My billfold belongs to me but this is a very tenuous sort of belonging. The way my billfold belongs to me pales in significance to, say, the way a bill belongs to a duck-billed platypus. It is not simply that the bill is physically attached to the platypus. Even if you were to cut off the bill of a platypus, this would just create a deformed platypus; it would not change the sense of necessary belonging that connects platypuses and bills. The deep nature of a platypus requires—it necessitates—a bill. In so much as logic is about discovering necessary relationships, it is not the mere arrangement of terms and symbols but their substantive meaning that is at issue.

As only one consequence of this “metaphysical attitude,” consider Aristotle’s attitude towards inductive generalizations. Aristotle would have no patience for the modern penchant for purely statistical interpretations of inductive generalizations. It is not the number of times something happens that matters. It is the deep nature of the thing that counts. If the wicked boy (or girl) next door pulls three legs off a spider, this is just happenstance. This five-legged spider does not (for Aristotle) present a serious counterexample to the claim that “all spiders are eight-legged.” The fact that someone can pull legs off a spider does not change the fact that there is a necessary connection between spiders and having eight legs. Aristotle is too keen a biologist not to recognize that there are accidents and monstrosities in the world, but the existence of these individual imperfections does not change the deep nature of things. Aristotle recognizes then that some types of belonging are more substantial—that is, more real—than others. But this has repercussions for the ways in which we evaluate arguments. In Aristotle’s mind, the strength of the logical connection that ties a conclusion to the premises in an argument depends, decisively, on the metaphysical status of the claims we are making. Another example may help. Suppose I were to argue, first: “Ostriches are birds; all birds have feathers, therefore, ostriches have feathers.” Then, second, “Hélène is the youngest daughter of the Tremblay family; all members of the Tremblay family wear red hats; therefore, Hélène wears a red hat.” These arguments possess the same form. (We will worry about formal details later.) But, to Aristotle’s way of thinking, the first argument is, logically, more rigorous than the second. Its conclusion follows from the essential and therefore necessary features of birds. In the second argument, the conclusion only follows from the contingent state of fashion in Quebec. In Aristotelian logic, the strength of an argument depends, in some important way, on metaphysical issues. We can’t simply say “All S are P; and so forth” and be done with it. We have to know what “S” and “P” stand for. This is very different than modern symbolic logic. Although Aristotle does use letters to take the place of variable terms in a logical relation, we should not be misled into thinking that the substantive content of what is being discussed does not matter.

9. The Syllogism

We are now in a position to consider Aristotle’s theory of the syllogism. Although one senses that Aristotle took great pride in these accomplishments, we could complain that the persistent focus on the mechanics of the valid syllogism has obscured his larger project. We will only cover the most basic points here, largely ignoring hypothetical syllogisms, modal syllogisms, extended syllogisms (sorites), inter alia. The syllogistic now taught in undergraduate philosophy departments represents a later development of Aristotle’s ideas, after they were reworked at the hands of Medieval and modern logicians. We will begin with a brief account of the way syllogisms are presented in modern logic and then move on to discussion of Aristotle’s somewhat different account.

We can define a syllogism, in relation to its logical form, as an argument made up of three categorical propositions, two premises (which set out the evidence), and a conclusion (that follows logically from the premises). In the standard account, the propositions are composed of three terms, a subject term, a predicate term, and a middle term: the subject term is the (grammatical) subject of the conclusion; the predicate term modifies the subject in the conclusion, and the middle term links the subject and predicate terms in the premises. The subject and predicate terms appear in different premises; the middle term appears once in each premise. The premise with the predicate term and the middle term is called the major premise; the premise with the subject term and the middle term is called the minor premise. Because syllogisms depend on the precise arrangement of terms, syllogistic logic is sometimes referred to as term logic. Most readers of this piece are already familiar with some version of a proverbial (non-Aristotelian) example: “All men are mortal; (all) Socrates, Plato, and Aristotle are men; therefore, Socrates, Plato and Aristotle are mortal.” If we symbolize the three terms in this syllogism such that Middle Term, M=man; Subject Term, S=Socrates, Plato, Aristotle; Predicate Term, P=mortal; we can represent the argument as: Major Premise: All M is P; Minor Premise: All S is M; Conclusion: So, All S is P. In the Middle Ages, scholars came up with Latin names for valid syllogisms, using vowels to represent the position of each categorical proposition. (Their list is readily available elsewhere.) The precise arrangement of propositions in this syllogism goes by the Latin moniker “Barbara” because the syllogism is composed of three A propositions: hence, BArbArA: AAA. A syllogism in Barbara is clearly valid where validity can be understood (in modern terms) as the requirement that if the premises of the argument are true, then the conclusion must be true. Modern textbook authors generally prove the validity of syllogisms in two ways. First, they use a number of different rules. For example: “when major and minor terms are universal in the conclusion they must be universal in the premises”; “if one premise is negative, the conclusion must be negative”; “the middle term in the premises must be distributed (include every member of a class) at least once,” and so on. Second, they use Venn diagrams, intersecting circles marked to indicate the extension (or range) of different terms, to determine if the information contained in the conclusion is also included in the premises.

Modern logicians, who still hold to traditional conventions, classify syllogisms according to figure and mood. The four figure classification derives from Aristotle; the mood classification, from Medieval logicians. One determines the figure of a syllogism by recording the positions the middle term takes in the two premises. So, for Barbara above, the figure is MP-SM, generally referred to as Figure 1. One determines the mood of a syllogism by recording the precise arrangement of categorical propositions. So, for Barbara, the mood is AAA. By tabulating figures and moods, we can make an inventory of valid syllogisms. (Medieval philosophers devised a mnemonic poem for such purposes that begins with the line “Barbara, Celarent, Darii, Ferioque priorisis.” Details can be found in many textbooks.) Although traditional classroom treatments prefer to stick to this time-honoured approach, Fred Sommers and George Englebretsen have devised a more up-to-date term logic that uses equations with “+” and “−” operators and is more attuned to natural language reasoning than the usual predicate logic. Turn then to a brief discussion of Aristotle’s own account of the syllogism.

As already mentioned, we need to distinguish between two kinds of necessity. Aristotle believes in metaphysical or natural necessity. Birds must have feathers because that is their nature. So the proposition “All birds have feathers” is necessarily true.” But Aristotle identifies the syllogistic form with the logical necessity that obtains when two separate propositions necessitate a third. He defines a sullogismos as “a discourse [logos] in which, certain things being stated, something other than what is stated follows of necessity from them.” (Prior Analytics, I.1.24b18-20, Jenkinson.) The emphasis here is on the sense of inevitable consequence that precipitates a conclusion when certain forms of propositions are added together. Indeed, the original Greek term for syllogism is more rigorously translated as “deduction.” In the Prior Analytics, Aristotle’s method is exploratory. He searches for pairs of propositions that combine to produce a necessary conclusion. He begins by accepting that a few syllogisms are self-evidently (or transparently) true. Barbara, AAA-Fig.1, discussed above, is the best example of this kind of “perfect syllogism.” Another example of a perfect syllogism is Celarent: EAE-Fig.1. On seeing the arrangement of terms in such cases, one immediately understands that the conclusion follows necessarily from the premises. In the case of imperfect syllogisms Aristotle relies on a method of proof that translates them, step-by-step, into perfect syllogisms through a careful rearrangement of terms. He does this directly, through conversion, or indirectly, through the relationships of contradiction and contrariety outlined in the square of opposition. To cite only one very simple example, consider a brief passage in the Prior Analytics (I.5.27a5ff) where Aristotle demonstrates that the propositions “No P are M,” and “All S are M” can be combined to produce a syllogism with the conclusion, “No S are P.” If “No P are M,” it must follow that “No M are P” (conversion); but “No M are P” combined with the second premise, “All S are M” proves that “No S are P.” (This is to reduce the imperfect syllogism Cesare to the perfect syllogism Celarent.) This conversion of an imperfect syllogism into a perfect syllogism demonstrates that the original arrangement of terms is a genuine deduction. In other cases, Aristotle proves that particular arrangements of terms cannot yield proper syllogisms by showing that, in these instances, true premises lead to obviously false or contradictory conclusions. Alongside these proofs of logical necessity, Aristotle derives general rules for syllogisms, classifies them according to figure, and so on.

It is important to reiterate that Aristotelian syllogisms are not (primarily) about hypothetical sets, imaginary classes, or purely abstract mathematical entities. Aristotle believes there are natural groups in the world—species and genera—made up of individual members that share a similar nature, and hence similar properties. It is this sharing of individual things in a similar nature that makes universal statements possible. Once we have universal terms, we can make over-arching statements that, when combined, lead inescapably to specific results. In the most rigorous syllogistic, metaphysical necessity is added to logical necessity to produce an unassailable inference. Seen in this Aristotelian light, syllogisms can be construed as a vehicle for identifying the deep, immutable natures that make things what they are.

Medieval logicians summarized their understanding of the rationale underlying the syllogism in the so-called dictum de omni et nullo (the maxim of all and none), the principle that whatever is affirmed or denied of a whole must be affirmed or denied of a part (which they alleged derived from a reading of Prior Analytics I.1.24b27-30). Some contemporary authors have claimed that Aristotelian syllogistic is at least compatible with a deflationary theory of truth, the modern idea that truth-claims about propositions amount to little more than an assertion of the statement itself. (To say that “S is P” is true, is just to assert “S is P.”) Perhaps it would be better to say that one can trace the modern preoccupation with validity in formal logic to the distinction between issues of logical necessity and propositional truth implicit in Aristotle. In Aristotle’s logic, arguments do not take the form: “this state of affairs is true/false,” “this state of affairs is true/false,” therefore this state of affairs is true/false.” We do not argue “All S is M is true” but merely, “All S is M.” When it comes to determining validity—that is, when it comes to determining whether we have discovered a true syllogism—the question of the truth or falsity of propositions is pushed aside and attention is focused on an evaluation of the logical connection between premises and conclusion. Obviously, Aristotle recognizes that ascertaining the material truth of premises is an important part of argument evaluation, but he does not present a “truth-functional” logic. The concept of a “truth value” does not play any explicit role in his formal analysis the way it does, for example, with modern truth tables. Mostly, Aristotle wants to know what we can confidently conclude from two presumably true premises; that is, what kind of knowledge can be produced or demonstrated if two given premises are true.

10. Inductive Syllogism

Understanding what Aristotle means by inductive syllogism is a matter of serious scholarly dispute. Although there is only abbreviated textual evidence to go by, his account of inductive argument can be supplemented by his ampler account of its rhetorical analogues, argument from analogy and argument from example. What is clear is that Aristotle thinks of induction (epagoge) as a form of reasoning that begins in the sense perception of particulars and ends in a understanding that can be expressed in a universal proposition (or even a concept). We pick up mental momentum through a familiarity with particular cases that allows us to arrive at a general understanding of an entire species or genus. As we discuss below, there are indications that Aristotle views induction, in the first instance, as a manifestation of immediate understanding and not as an argument form. Nonetheless, in the Prior Analytics II.23 (and 24), he casts inductive reasoning in syllogistic form, illustrating the “syllogism that springs out of induction” (ho ex epagoges sullogismos) by an argument about the longevity of bileless animals.

Relying on old biological ideas, Aristotle argues that we can move from observations about the longevity of individual species of bileless animals (that is, animals with clean-blood) to the universal conclusion that bilelessness is a cause of longevity. His argument can be paraphrased in modern English: All men, horses, mules, and so forth, are long-lived; all men, horses, mules, and so forth, are bileless animals; therefore, all bileless animals are long-lived. Although this argument seems, by modern standards, invalid, Aristotle apparently claims that it is a valid deduction. (Remember that the word “syllogism” means “deduction,” so an “inductive syllogism” is, literally, an “inductive deduction.”) He uses a technical notion of “convertibility” to formally secure the validity of the argument. According to this logical rule, terms that cover the same range of cases (because they refer to the same nature) are interchangeable (antistrepho). They can be substituted for one another. Aristotle believes that because the logical terms “men, horses, mules, etc” and “bileless animals” refer to the same genus, they are convertible. If, however, we invert the terms in the proposition “all men, horses, mules, and so forth, are bileless animals” to “all bileless animals are men, horses, mules, and so forth,” we can then rephrase the original argument: All men, horses, mules, and so forth, are long-lived; all bileless animals are men, horses, mules, and so forth; therefore, all bileless animals are long-lived. This revised induction possesses an obviously valid form (Barbara, discussed above). Note that Aristotle does not view this inversion of terms as a formal gimmick or trick; he believes that it reflects something metaphysically true about shared natures in the world. (One could argue that inductive syllogism operates by means of the quantification of the predicate term as well as the subject term of a categorical proposition, but we will not investigate that issue here.)

These passages pose multiple problems of interpretation. We can only advance a general overview of the most important disagreements here. We might identify four different interpretations of Aristotle’s account of the inductive syllogism. (1) The fact that Aristotle seems to view this as a valid syllogism has led many commentators (such as Ross, McKirahan, Peters) to assume that he is referring to what is known as “perfect induction,” a generalization that is built up from a complete enumeration of particular cases. The main problem here is that it seems to involve a physical impossibility. No one could empirically inspect every bileless animal (and/or species) to ascertain that the connection between bilelessness and longevity obtains in every case. (2) Some commentators combine this first explanation with the further suggestion that the bileless example is a rare case and that Aristotle believes, in line with modern accounts, that most inductions only produce probable belief. (Cf. Govier’s claim that there is a “tradition going back to Aristotle, which maintains that there are . . . only two broad types of argument: deductive arguments which are conclusive, and inductive arguments, which are not.” (Problems in Argument Analysis, 52.)) One problem with such claims is that they overlook the clear distinction that Aristotle makes between rigorous inductions and rhetorical inductions (which we discuss below). (3) Some commentators claim that Aristotle (and the ancients generally) overlooked the inherent tenuousness of the inductive reasoning. On this account, Empiricists such as Locke and Hume discovered something seriously wrong about induction that escaped the notice of an ancient author like Aristotle. Philosophers in the modern Anglo-American tradition largely favor this interpretation. (Cf. Garrett’s and Barbanell’s insistence that “Hume was the first to raise skeptical doubts about inductive reasoning, leaving a puzzle as to why the concerns he highlighted had earlier been so completely overlooked.” (“Induction,” 172.) Such allegations do not depend, however, on any close reading of a wealth of relevant passages in the Aristotelian corpus and in ancient philosophy generally. (4) Finally, a minority contemporary view, growing in prominence, has argued that Aristotle did not conceive of induction as an enumerative process but as a matter of intelligent insight into natures. (Cf. McCaskey, Biondi, Rijk , Groarke.) On this account, Aristotle does not mean to suggest that inductive syllogism depends on an empirical inspection of every member of a group but on a universal act of understanding that operates through sense perception. Aristotelian induction can best be compared to modern notions of abduction or inference to the best explanation. This non-mathematical account has historical precedents in neo-Platonism, Thomism, Idealism, and in the textbook literature of traditionalist modern logicians that opposed the new formal logic. This view has been criticized, however, as a form of mere intuitionism dependent on an antiquated metaphysics.

The basic idea that induction is valid will raise eyebrows, no doubt. It is important to stave off some inevitable criticism before continuing. Modern accounts of induction, deriving, in large part, from Hume and Locke, display a mania for prediction. (Hence Hume’s question: how can we know that the future bread we eat will nourish us based on past experience of eating bread?) But this is not primarily how Aristotle views the problem. For Aristotle, induction is about understanding natural kinds. Once we comprehend the nature of something, we will, of course, be able to make predictions about its future properties, but understanding its nature is the key. In Aristotle’s mind, rigorous induction is valid because it picks out those necessary and essential traits that make something what it is. To use a very simple example, understanding that all spiders have eight legs—that is, that all undamaged spiders have eight legs—is a matter of knowing something deep about the biological nature that constitutes a spider. Something that does not have eight legs is not a spider. (Fruitful analogies might be drawn here to the notion of “a posteriori necessity” countenanced by contemporary logicians such as Hilary Putnam and Saul Kripke or to the “revised” concept of a “natural kind” advanced by authors such as Hilary Kornblith or Brian Ellis.)

It is commonly said that Aristotle sees syllogisms as a device for explaining relationships between groups. This is, in the main, true. Still, there has to be some room for a consideration of individuals in logic if we hope to include induction as an essential aspect of reasoning. As Aristotle explains, induction begins in sense perception and sense perception only has individuals as its object. Some commentators would limit inductive syllogism to a movement from smaller groups (what Aristotle calls “primitive universals”) to larger groups, but one can only induce a generalization about a smaller group on the basis of a prior observation of individuals that compose that group. A close reading reveals that Aristotle himself mentions syllogisms dealing with individuals (about the moon, Topics, 78b4ff; about the wall, 78b13ff; about the eclipse, Posterior Analytics, 93a29ff, and so on.) If we treat individuals as universal terms or as representative of universal classes, this poses no problem for formal analysis. Collecting observations about one individual or about individuals who belong to a larger group can lead to an accurate generalization.

11. Deduction versus Induction

We cannot fully understand the nature or role of inductive syllogism in Aristotle without situating it with respect to ordinary, “deductive” syllogism. Aristotle’s distinction between deductive and inductive argument is not precisely equivalent to the modern distinction. Contemporary authors differentiate between deduction and induction in terms of validity. (A small group of informal logicians called “Deductivists” dispute this account.) According a well-worn formula, deductive arguments are valid; inductive arguments are invalid. The premises in a deductive argument guarantee the truth of the conclusion: if the premises are true, the conclusion must be true. The premises in an inductive argument provide some degree of support for the conclusion, but it is possible to have true premises and a false conclusion. Although some commentators attribute such views to Aristotle, this distinction between strict logical necessity and merely probable or plausible reasoning more easily maps onto the distinction Aristotle makes between scientific and rhetorical reasoning (both of which we discuss below). Aristotle views inductive syllogism as scientific (as opposed to rhetorical) induction and therefore as a more rigorous form of inductive argument.

We can best understand what this amounts to by a careful comparison of a deductive and an inductive syllogism on the same topic. If we reconstruct, along Aristotelian lines, a deduction on the longevity of bileless animals, the argument would presumably run: All bileless animals are long-lived; all men, horses, mules, and so forth, are bileless animals; therefore, all men, horses, mules, and so forth, are long-lived. Defining the terms in this syllogism as: Subject Term, S=men, horses, mules, and so forth; Predicate Term, P=long-lived animals; Middle Term, M=bileless animals, we can represent this metaphysically correct inference as: Major Premise: All M are P. Minor Premise: All S are M. Conclusion: Therefore all S are P. (Barbara.) As we already have seen, the corresponding induction runs: All men, horses, mules, and so forth, are long-lived; all men, horses, mules, and so forth, are bileless animals; therefore, all bileless animals are long-lived. Using the same definition of terms, we are left with: Major Premise: All S are P. Minor Premise: All S are M (convertible to All M are S). Conclusion: Therefore, all M are P. (Converted to Barbara.) The difference between these two inferences is the difference between deductive and inductive argument in Aristotle.

Clearly, Aristotelian and modern treatments of these issues diverge. As we have already indicated, in the modern formalism, one automatically defines subject, predicate, and middle terms of a syllogism according to their placement in the argument. For Aristotle, the terms in a rigorous syllogism have a metaphysical significance as well. In our correctly formulated deductive-inductive pair, S represents individual species and/or the individuals that make up those species (men, horses, mules, and so forth); M represents the deep nature of these things (bilelessness), and P represents the property that necessarily attaches to that nature (longevity). Here then is the fundamental difference between Aristotelian deduction and induction in a nutshell. In deduction, we prove that a property (P) belongs to individual species (S) because it possesses a certain nature (M); in induction, we prove that a property (P) belongs to a nature (M) because it belongs to individual species (S). Expressed formally, deduction proves that the subject term (S) is associated with a predicate term (P) by means of the middle term (M); induction proves that the middle term (M) is associated with the predicate term (P) by means of the subject term (S). (Cf. Prior Analytics, II.23.68b31-35.) Aristotle does not claim that inductive syllogism is invalid but that the terms in an induction have been rearranged. In deduction, the middle term joins the two extremes (the subject and predicate terms); in induction, one extreme, the subject term, acts as the middle term, joining the true middle term with the other extreme. This is what Aristotle means when he maintains that in induction one uses a subject term to argue to a middle term. Formally, with respect to the arrangement of terms, the subject term becomes the “middle term” in the argument.

Aristotle distinguishes then between induction and deduction in three different ways. First, induction moves from particulars to a universal, whereas deduction moves from a universal to particulars. The bileless induction moves from particular species to a universal nature; the bileless deduction moves from a universal nature to particular species. Second, induction moves from observation to language (that is, from sense perception to propositions), whereas deduction moves from language to language (from propositions to a new proposition). The bileless induction is really a way of demonstrating how observations of bileless animals lead to (propositional) knowledge about longevity; the bileless deduction demonstrates how (propositional) knowledge of a universal nature leads (propositional) knowledge about particular species. Third, induction identifies or explains a nature, whereas deduction applies or demonstrates a nature. The bileless induction provides an explanation of the nature of particular species: it is of the nature of bileless organisms to possess a long life. The bileless deduction applies that finding to particular species; once we know that it is of the nature of bileless organisms to possess a long life, we can demonstrate or put on display the property of longevity as it pertains to particular species.

One final point needs clarification. The logical form of the inductive syllogism, after the convertibility maneuver, is the same as the deductive syllogism. In this sense, induction and deduction possess the same (final) logical form. But, of course, in order to successfully perform an induction, one has to know that convertibility is possible, and this requires an act of intelligence which is able to discern the metaphysical realities between things out in the world. We discuss this issue under non-discursive reasoning below.

12. Science

Aristotle wants to construct a logic that provides a working language for rigorous science as he understands it. Whereas we have been talking of syllogisms as arguments, Aristotelian science is about explanation. Admittedly, informal logicians generally distinguish between explanation and argument. An argument is intended to persuade about a debatable point; an explanation is not intended to persuade so much as to promote understanding. Aristotle views science as involving logical inferences that move beyond what is disputable to a consideration of what is the case. Still, the “explanatory” syllogisms used in science possess precisely the same formal structures as “argumentative” syllogisms. So we might consider them arguments in a wider sense. For his part, Aristotle relegates eristic reason to the broad field of rhetoric. He views science, perhaps naively, as a domain of established fact. The syllogisms used in science are about establishing an explanation from specific cases (induction) and then applying or illustrating this explanation to specific cases (deduction).

The ancient Greek term for science, “episteme,” is not precisely equivalent to its modern counterpart. In Aristotle’s worldview, science, as the most rigorous sort of discursive knowledge, is opposed to mere opinion (doxa); it is about what is universal and necessary as opposed to what is particular and contingent, and it is theoretical as opposed to practical. Aristotle believes that knowledge, understood as justified true belief, is most perfectly expressed in a scientific demonstration (apodeixis), also known as an apodeitic or scientific syllogism. He posits a number of specific requirements for this most rigorous of all deductions. In order to qualify as a scientific demonstration, a syllogism must possess premises that are “true, primary, immediate, better known than, prior to, and causative of the conclusion.” (Posterior Analytics, I.2.71b20ff, Tredennick.) It must yield information about a natural kind or a group of individual things. And it must produce universal knowledge (episteme). Specialists have disputed the meaning of these individual requirements, but the main message is clear. Aristotle accepts, as a general rule, that a conclusion in an argument cannot be more authoritative than the premises that led to that conclusion. We cannot derive better (or more reliable) knowledge from worse (or less reliable) knowledge. Given that a scientific demonstration is the most rigorous form of knowledge possible, we must start with premises that are utterly basic and as certain as possible, which are “immediately” induced from observation, and which confirm to the necessary structure of the world in a way that is authoritative and absolutely incontrovertible. This requires a reliance on first principles which we discuss below.

In the best case scenario, Aristotelian science is about finding definitions of species that, according to a somewhat bald formula, identify the genus (the larger natural group) and the differentia (that unique feature that sets the species apart from the larger group). As Aristotle’s focus on definitions is a bit cramped and less than consistent (he himself spends a great deal of time talking about necessary rather than essential properties), let us broaden his approach to science to focus on ostensible definitions, where an ostensible definition is either a rigorous definition or, more broadly, any properly-formulated phrase that identifies the unique properties of something. On this looser approach, which is more consistent with Aristotle’s actual practice, to define an entity is to identify the nature, the essential and necessary properties, that make it uniquely what it is. Suffice it to say that Aristotle’s idealized account of what science entails needs to be expanded to cover a wide range of activities and that fall under what is now known as scientific practice. What follows is a general sketch of his overall orientation. (We should point out that Aristotle himself resorts to whatever informal methods seem appropriate when reporting on his own biological investigations without too much concern for any fixed ideal of formal correctness. He makes no attempt to cast his own scientific conclusions in metaphysically-correct syllogisms. One could perhaps insist that he uses enthymemes (syllogisms with unstated premises), but mostly, he just seems to record what seems appropriate without any deliberate attempt at correct formalization. Note that most of Aristotle’s scientific work is “historia,” an earlier stage of observing, fact-collecting, and opinion-reporting that proceeds the principled theorizing of advanced science.)

For Aristotle, even theology is a science insomuch as it deals with universal and necessary principles. Still, in line with modern attitudes (and in opposition to Plato), Aristotle views sense-perception as the proper route to scientific knowledge. Our empirical experience of the world yields knowledge through induction. Aristotle elaborates then an inductive-deductive model of science. Through careful observation of particular species, the scientist induces an ostensible definition to explain a nature and then demonstrates the consequences of that nature for particular species. Consider a specific case. In the Posterior Analytics (II.16-17.98b32ff, 99a24ff), Aristotle mentions an explanation about why deciduous plants lose their leaves in the winter. The ancients apparently believed this happens because sap coagulates at the base of the leaf (which is not entirely off the mark). We can use this ancient example of a botanical explanation to illustrate how the business of Aristotelian science is supposed to operate. Suppose we are a group of ancient botanists who discover, through empirical inspection, why deciduous plants such as vines and figs lose their leaves. Following Aristotle’s lead, we can cast our discovery in the form of the following inductive syllogism: “Vine, fig, and so forth, are deciduous. Vine, fig, and so forth, coagulate sap. Therefore, all sap-coagulators are deciduous.” This induction produces the definition of “deciduous.” (“Deciduous” is the definiendum; sap-coagulation, the definiens; the point being that everything that is a sap-coagulator is deciduous, which might not be the case if we turned it around and said “All deciduous plants are sap-coagulators.”) But once we have a definition of “deciduous,” we can use it as the first premise in a deduction to demonstrate something about say, the genus “broad-leaved trees.” We can apply, in other words, what we have learned about deciduous plants in general to the more specific genus of broad-leaved trees. Our deduction will read: “All sap-coagulators are deciduous. All broad-leaved trees are sap-coagulators. Therefore, all broad-leaved trees are deciduous.” We can express all this symbolically. For the induction, where S=vine, fig, and so forth, P=deciduous, M= being a sap-coagulator, the argument is: “All S is P; all S is M (convertible to all M is S); therefore, all M are P (converted to Barbara). For the deduction, where S=broad-leafed trees, M=being a sap-coagulator, P=deciduous, the argument can be represented: “All M are P; all S is M; therefore, all S is P” (Barbara). This is then the basic logic of Aristotelian science.

A simple diagram of how science operates follows (Figure 2).

Figure 2

The Inductive-Deductive Method of Aristotelian Science

Aristotle views science as a search for causes (aitia). In a well-known example about planets not twinkling because they are close to the earth (Posterior Analytics, I.13), he makes an important distinction between knowledge of the fact and knowledge of the reasoned fact. The rigorous scientist aims at knowledge of the reasoned fact which explains why something is the way it is. In our example, sap-coagulation is the cause of deciduous; deciduous is not the cause of sap-coagulation. That is why “sap-coagulation” is featured here as the middle term, because it is the cause of the phenomenon being investigated. The deduction “All sap-coagulators are deciduous; all broad-leaved trees are sap-coagulators; therefore, all broad-leaved trees are deciduous” counts as knowledge of the reasoned fact because it reveals the cause of broad-leafed deciduousness.

Aristotle makes a further distinction between what is more knowable relative to us and what is more knowable by nature (or in itself). He remarks in the Physics, “The natural way of [inquiry] is to start from the things which are more knowable and obvious to us and proceed towards those which are clearer and more knowable by nature; for the same things are not ‘knowable relatively to us’ and ‘knowable’ without qualification.” (I.184a15, Hardie, Gaye.) In science we generally move from the effect to the cause, from what we see and observe around us to the hidden origins of things. The outward manifestation of the phenomenon of “deciduousness” is more accessible to us because we can see the trees shedding their leaves, but sap-coagulation as an explanatory principle is more knowable in itself because it embodies the cause. To know about sap-coagulation counts as an advance in knowledge; someone who knows this knows more than someone who only knows that trees shed their leaves in the fall. Aristotle believes that the job of science is to put on display what best counts as knowledge, even if the resulting theory strays from our immediate perceptions and first concerns.

Jan Lukasiewicz, a modern-day pioneer in term logic, comments that “some queer philosophical prejudices which cannot be explained rationally” made early commentators claim that the major premise in a syllogism (the one with the middle and predicate terms) must be first. (Aristotle’s Syllogistic, 32.) But once we view the syllogism within the larger context of Aristotelian logic, it becomes perfectly obvious why these early commentators put the major premise first: because it constitutes the (ostensible) definition; because it contains an explanation of the nature of the thing upon which everything else depends. The major premise in a scientific deduction is the most important part of the syllogism; it is scientifically prior in that it reveals the cause that motivates the phenomenon. So it makes sense to place it first. This was not an irrational prejudice.

13. Non-Discursive Reasoning

The distinction Aristotle draws between discursive knowledge (that is, knowledge through argument) and non-discursive knowledge (that is, knowledge through nous) is akin to the medieval distinction between ratio (argument) and intellectus (direct intellection). In Aristotelian logic, non-discursive knowledge comes first and provides the starting points upon which discursive or argumentative knowledge depends. It is hard to know what to call the mental power that gives rise to this type of knowledge in English. The traditional term “intuition” invites misunderstanding. When Aristotle claims that there is an immediate sort of knowledge that comes directly from the mind (nous) without discursive argument, he is not suggesting that knowledge can be accessed through vague feelings or hunches. He is referring to a capacity for intelligent appraisal that might be better described as discernment, comprehension, or insight. Like his later medieval followers, he views “intuition” as a species of reason; it is not prior to reason or outside of reason, it is—in the highest degree—the activity of reason itself. (Cf. Posterior Analytics, II. 19; Nicomachean Ethics, IV.6.)

For Aristotle, science is only one manifestation of human intelligence. He includes, for example, intuition, craft, philosophical wisdom, and moral decision-making along with science in his account of the five intellectual virtues. (Nicomachean Ethics, VI.3-8.) When it comes to knowledge-acquisition, however, intuition is primary. It includes the most basic operations of intelligence, providing the ultimate ground of understanding and inference upon which everything else depends. Aristotle is a firm empiricist. He believes that knowledge begins in perception, but he also believes that we need intuition to make sense of perception. In the Posterior Analytics (II.19.100a3-10), Aristotle posits a sequence of steps in mental development: sense perception produces memory which (in combination with intuition) produces human experience (empeiria), which produces art and science. Through a widening movement of understanding (really, a non-discursive form of induction), intuition transforms observation and memory so as to produce knowledge (without argument). This intuitive knowledge is even more reliable than science. As Aristotle writes in key passages at the end of the Posterior Analytics, “no other kind of thought except intuition is more accurate than scientific knowledge,” and “nothing except intuition can be truer than scientific knowledge.” (100b8ff, Mure, slightly emended.)

Aristotelian intuition supplies the first principles (archai) of human knowledge: concepts, universal propositions, definitions, the laws of logic, the primary principles of the specialized science, and even moral concepts such as the various virtues. This is why, according to Aristotle, intuition must be viewed as infallible. We cannot claim that the first principles of human intelligence are dubious and then turn around and use those principles to make authoritative claims about the possibility (or impossibility) of knowledge. If we begin to doubt intuition, that is, human intelligence at its most fundamental level of operation, we will have to doubt everything else that is built upon this universal foundation: science, philosophy, knowledge, logic, inference, and so forth. Aristotle never tries to prove first principles. He acknowledges that when it comes to the origins of human thought, there is a point when one must simply stop asking questions. As he points out, any attempt at absolute proof would lead to an infinite regress. In his own words: “It is impossible that there should be demonstration of absolutely everything; there would be an infinite regress, so that there would still be no demonstration.” (Metaphysics, 1006a6ff, Ross.) Aristotle does make arguments, for example, that meaningful speech presupposes a logical axiom like the principle of non-contradiction, but that is not, strictly speaking, a proof of the principle.

Needless to say, Aristotle’s reliance on intuition has provoked a good deal of scholarly disagreement. Contemporary commentators such as Joseph Owens, G. L. Owen, and Terrence Irwin have argued that Aristotelian first principles begin in dialectic. On their influential account, we arrive at first principles through a weaker form of argument that revolves around a consideration of “endoxa,” the proverbial opinions of the many and/or the wise. Robin Smith (and others) severely criticize their account. The idea that mere opinion could somehow give rise to rigorous scientific knowledge conflicts with Aristotle’s settled view that less reliable knowledge cannot provide sufficient logical support for the more reliable knowledge. As we discuss below, endoxa do provide a starting point for dialectical (and ethical) arguments in Aristotle’s system. They are, in his mind, a potent intellectual resource, a library of stored wisdom and right opinion. They may include potent expressions of first principles already discovered by other thinkers and previous generations. But as Aristotle makes clear at the end of the Posterior Analytics and elsewhere, the recognition that something is a first principle depends directly on intuition. As he reaffirms in the Nicomachean Ethics, “it is intuitive reason that grasps the first principles.” (VI.6.1141a7, Ross.)

If Irwin and his colleagues seek to limit the role of intuition in Aristotle, authors such as Lambertus Marie de Rijk and D. W. Hamlyn go to an opposite extreme, denying the importance of the inductive syllogism and identifying induction (epagoge) exclusively with intuition. De Rijk claims that Aristotelian induction is “a pre-argumentation procedure consisting in . . . [a] disclosure [that] does not take place by a formal, discursive inference, but is, as it were, jumped upon by an intuitive act of knowledge.” (Semantics and Ontology, I.2.53, 141-2.) Although this position seems extreme, it seems indisputable that inductive syllogism depends on intuition, for without intuition (understood as intelligent discernment), one could not recognize the convertibility of subject and middle terms (discussed above). Aristotle also points out that one needs intuition to recognize the (ostensible) definitions so crucial to the practice of Aristotelian science. We must be able to discern the difference between accidental and necessary or essential properties before coming up with a definition. This can only come about through some kind of direct (non-discursive) discernment. Aristotle proposes a method for discovering definitions called division—we are to divide things into smaller and smaller sub-groups—but this method depends wholly on nous. (Cf. Posterior Analytics, II.13.) Some modern Empiricist commentators, embarrassed by such mystical-sounding doctrines, warn that this emphasis on non-discursive reasoning collapses into pure rationalism (or Platonism), but this is a caricature. What Aristotle means by rational “intuition” is not a matter of pure, disembodied thought. One does not arrive at first principles by closing one’s eyes and retreating from the world (as with Cartesian introspection). For Aristotle, first principles arise through a vigorous interaction of the empirical with the rational; a combination of rationality and sense experience produces the first seeds of human understanding.

Note that Aristotle believes that there are first principles (koinai archai) that are common to all fields of inquiry, such as the principle of non-contradiction or the law of excluded middle, and that each specialized science has its own first principles. We may recover these first principles second-hand by a (dialectical) review of authorities. Or, we can derive them first hand by analysis, by dividing the subject matter we are concerned with into its constituent parts. At the beginning of the Physics, Aristotle explains, “What is to us plain and obvious at first is rather confused masses, the elements and principles of which become known to us later by analysis. Thus we must advance from generalities to particulars; for it is a whole that is best known to sense-perception, and a generality is a kind of whole, comprehending many things within it, like parts. . . . Similarly a child begins by calling all men ‘father,’ and all women ‘mother,’ but later on distinguishes each of them.” (I.1.184a22-184b14, Hardie, Gaye.) Just as children learn to distinguish their parents from other human beings, those who successfully study a science learn to distinguish the different natural kinds that make up the whole of a scientific phenomenon. This precedes the work of induction and deduction already discussed. Once we have the parts (or the aspects), we can reason about them scientifically.

14. Rhetoric

Argumentation theorists (less aptly characterized as informal logicians) have critiqued the ascendancy of formal logic, complaining that the contemporary penchant for symbolic logic leaves one with an abstract mathematics of empty signs that cannot be applied in any useful way to larger issues. Proponents of formal logic counter that their specialized formalism allows for a degree of precision otherwise not available and that any focus on the substantive meaning or truth of propositions is a distraction from logical issues per se. We cannot readily fit Aristotle into one camp or the other. Although he does provide a formal analysis of the syllogism, he intends logic primarily as a means of acquiring true statements about the world. He also engages in an enthusiastic investigation of less rigorous forms of reasoning included in the study of dialectic and rhetoric.

Understanding precisely what Aristotle means by the term “dialectics” (dialektike) is no easy task. He seems to view it as the technical study of argument in general or perhaps as a more specialized investigation into argumentative dialogue. He intends his rhetoric (rhetorike), which he describes as the counterpart to dialectic, as an expansive study of the art of persuasion, particularly as it is directed towards a non-academic public. Suffice it to say, for our purposes, that Aristotle reserves a place in his logic for a general examination of all arguments, for scientific reasoning, for rhetoric, for debating techniques of various sorts, for jurisprudential pleading, for cross-examination, for moral reasoning, for analysis, and for non-discursive intuition.

Aristotle distinguishes between what I will call, for convenience, rigorous logic and persuasive logic. Rigorous logic aims at epistēmē, true belief about what is eternal, necessary, universal, and unchanging. (Aristotle sometimes qualifies this to include “for the most part” scientific knowledge.) Persuasive logic aims at acceptable, probable, or convincing belief (what we might call “opinion” instead of knowledge.) It deals with approximate truth, with endoxa (popular or proverbial opinions), with reasoning that is acceptable to a particular audience, or with claims about accidental properties and contingent events. Persuasive syllogisms have the same form as rigorous syllogisms but are understood as establishing their conclusions in a weaker manner. As we have already seen, rigorous logic produces deductive and inductive syllogisms; Aristotle indicates that persuasive logic produces, in a parallel manner, enthymemes, analogies, and examples. He defines an enthymeme as a deduction “concerned with things which may, generally speaking, be other than they are,” with matters that are “for the most part only generally true,” or with “probabilities and signs” (Rhetoric, I.2.1357a, Roberts). He also mentions that the term “enthymeme” may refer to arguments with missing premises. (Rhetoric, 1.2.1357a16-22.) When it comes to induction, Aristotle’s presentation is more complicated, but we can reconstruct what he means in a more straightforward manner.

The persuasive counterpart to the inductive syllogism is the analogy and the example, but the example is really a composite argument formed from first, an analogy and second, an enthymeme. Some initial confusion is to be expected as Aristotle’s understanding of analogies differs somewhat from contemporary accounts. In contemporary treatments, analogies depend on a direct object(s)-to-object(s) comparison. Aristotelian analogy, on the other hand, involves reasoning up to a general principle. We are to conclude (1) that because individual things of a certain nature X have property z, everything that possesses nature X has property z. But once we know that every X possesses property z, we can make a deduction (2) that some new example of nature X will also have property z. Aristotle calls (1), the inductive movement up to the generalization, an analogy (literally, an argument from likeness=ton homoion); he calls (2), the deductive movement down to a new case, an enthymeme; and he considers (1) + (2), the combination of the analogy and the enthymeme together, an example (paradeigma). He presents the following argument from example in the Rhetoric (I.2.1357b31-1358a1). Suppose we wish to argue that Dionysus, the ruler, is asking for a bodyguard in order to set himself up as despot. We can establish this by a two-step process. First, we can draw a damning analogy between previous cases where rulers asked for a bodyguard and induce a general rule about such practices. We can insist that Peisistratus, Theagenes, and other known tyrants, were scheming to make themselves despots, that Peisistratus, Theagenes, and other known tyrants also asked for a bodyguard, and that therefore, everyone who asks for a bodyguard is scheming to make themselves dictators. But once we have established this general rule, we can move on to the second step in our argument, using this conclusion as a premise in an enthymeme. We can argue that all people asking for a bodyguard are scheming to make themselves despots, that Dionysius is someone asking for a bodyguard, and that therefore, Dionysius must be scheming to make himself despot. This is not, in Aristotle’s mind, rigorous reasoning. Nonetheless, we can, in this way, induce probable conclusions and then use them to deduce probable consequences. Although these arguments are intended to be persuasive or plausible rather than scientific, but the reasoning strategy mimics the inductive-deductive movement of science (without compelling, of course, the same degree of belief).

We should point out that Aristotle does not restrict himself to a consideration of purely formal issues in his discussion of rhetoric. He famously distinguishes, for example, between three means of persuasion: ethos, pathos, and logos. As we read, at the beginning of his Rhetoric: “Of the modes of persuasion furnished by the spoken word there are three kinds. . . . [Firstly,] persuasion is achieved by the speaker’s personal character when the speech is so spoken as to make us think him credible. . . . Secondly, persuasion may come through the hearers, when the speech stirs their emotions. . . . Thirdly, persuasion is effected through the speech itself when we have proved [the point] by means of the persuasive arguments suitable to the case in question.” (Rhetoric, I.2.1356a2-21, Roberts.) Aristotle concludes that effective arguers must (1) understand morality and be able to convince an audience that they themselves are good, trustworthy people worth listening to (ethos); (2) know the general causes of emotion and be able to elicit them from specific audience (pathos); and (3) be able to use logical techniques to make convincing (not necessarily sound) arguments (logos). Aristotle broaches many other issues we cannot enter into here. He acknowledges that the goal of rhetoric is persuasion, not truth. Such techniques may be bent to immoral or dishonest ends. Nonetheless, he insists that it is in the public interest to provide a comprehensive and systematic survey of the field.

We might mention two other logical devices that have a place in Aristotle’s work: the topos and the aporia. Unfortunately, Aristotle never explicitly explains what a topos is. The English word “topic” does not do justice to the original notion, for although Aristotelian topoi may be organized around subject matter, they focus more precisely on recommended strategies for successful arguing. (The technical term derives from a Greek word referring to a physical location. Some scholars suggest a link to ancient mnemonic techniques that superimposed lists on familiar physical locations as a memory aid.) In relevant discussions (in the Topics and the Rhetoric) Aristotle offers helpful advice about finding (or remembering) suitable premises, about verbally out-manoeuvring an opponent, about finding forceful analogies, and so on. Examples of specific topoi would include discussions about how to argue which is the better of two alternatives, how to substitute terms effectively, how to address issues about genus and property, how to argue about cause and effect, how to conceive of sameness and difference, and so on. Some commentators suggest that different topoi may have been used in a classroom situation in conjunction with student exercises and standardized texts, or with written lists of endoxa, or even with ready-made arguments that students were expected to memorize.

An aporia is a common device in Greek philosophy. The Greek word aporia (plural, aporiai) refers to a physical location blocked off by obstacles where there is no way out; by extension, it means, in philosophy, a mental perplexity, an impasse, a paradox or puzzle that stoutly resists solution. Aristotle famously suggests that philosophers begin with aporiai and complete their task by resolving the apparent paradoxes. An attentive reader will uncover many aporiai in Aristotle who begins many of his treatises with a diaporia, a survey of the puzzles that occupied previous thinkers. Note that aporiai cannot be solved through some mechanical rearrangement of symbolic terms. Solving puzzles requires intelligence and discernment; it requires some creative insight into what is at stake.

15. Fallacies

In a short work entitled Sophistical Refutations, Aristotle introduces a theory of logical fallacies that has been remarkably influential. His treatment is abbreviated and somewhat obscure, and there is inevitably scholarly disagreement about precise exegesis. Aristotle thinks of fallacies as instances of specious reasoning; they are not merely errors but hidden errors. A fallacy is an incorrect reasoning strategy that gives the illusion of being sound or somehow conceals the underlying problem. Aristotle divides fallacies into two broad categories: those which depend on language (sometimes called verbal fallacies) and those that are independent of language (sometimes called material fallacies). There is some scholarly disagreement about particular fallacies, but traditional English names and familiar descriptions follow. Linguistic fallacies include: homonymy (verbal equivocation), ambiguity (amphiboly or grammatical equivocation), composition (confusing parts with a whole), division (confusing a whole with parts), accent (equivocation that arises out of mispronunciation or misplaced emphasis) and figure of speech (ambiguity resulting from the form of an expression). Independent fallacies include accident (overlooking exceptions), converse accident (hasty generalization or improper qualification), irrelevant conclusion, affirming the consequent (assuming an effect guarantees the presence of one possible cause), begging the question (assuming the point), false cause, and complex question (disguising two or more questions as one). Logicians, influenced by scholastic logic, often gave these characteristic mistakes Latin names: compositio for composition, divisio for division, secundum quid et simpliciter for converse accident, ignoranti enlenchi for nonrelevant conclusion, and petitio principii for begging the question.

Consider three brief examples of fallacies from Aristotle’s original text. Aristotle formulates the following amphiboly (which admittedly sounds awkward in English): “I wish that you the enemy may capture.” (Sophistical Refutations, 4.166a7-8, Pickard-Cambridge.) Clearly, the grammatical structure of the statement leaves it ambiguous as to whether the speaker is hoping that the enemy or “you” be captured. In discussing complex question, he supplies the following perplexing example: “Ought one to obey the wise or one’s father?” (Ibid., 12.173a21.) Obviously, from a Greek perspective, one ought to obey both. The problem is that the question has been worded in such a way that anyone who answers will be forced to reject one moral duty in order to embrace the other. In fact, there are two separate questions here—Should one obey the wise? Should one obey one’s father?—that have been illegitimately combined to produce a single question with a single answer. Finally, Aristotle provides the following time-honoured example of affirming the consequent: “Since after the rain the ground is wet, we suppose that if the ground is wet, it has been raining; whereas that does not necessarily follow” (Ibid., 5.167b5-8.) Aristotle’s point is that assuming that the same effect never has more than one cause misconstrues the true nature of the world. The same effect may have several causes. Many of Aristotle’s examples have to do with verbal tricks which are entirely unconvincing—for example, the person who commits the fallacy of division by arguing that the number “5” is both even and odd because it can be divided into an even and an odd number: “2” and “3.” (Ibid., 4.166a32-33.) But the interest here is theoretical: figuring out where an obviously-incorrect argument or proposition went wrong. We should note that much of this text, which deals with natural language argumentation, does not presuppose the syllogistic form. Aristotle does spend a good bit of time considering how fallacies are related to one another. Fallacy theory, it is worth adding, is a thriving area of research in contemporary argumentation theory. Some of these issues are hotly debated.

16. Moral Reasoning

In the modern world, many philosophers have argued that morality is a matter of feelings, not reason. Although Aristotle recognizes the connative (or emotional) side of morality, he takes a decidedly different tack. As a virtue ethicist, he does not focus on moral law but views morality through the lens of character. An ethical person develops a capacity for habitual decision-making that aims at good, reliable traits such as honesty, generosity, high-mindedness, and courage. To modern ears, this may not sound like reason-at-work, but Aristotle argues that only human beings—that is, rational animals—are able to tell the difference between right and wrong. He widens his account of rationality to include a notion of practical wisdom (phronesis), which he defines as “a true and reasoned state of capacity to act with regard to the things that are good or bad for man.” (Nicomachean Ethics, VI.5.1140b4-5, Ross, Urmson). The operation of practical wisdom, which is more about doing than thinking, displays an inductive-deductive pattern similar to science as represented in Figure 3. It depends crucially on intuition or nous. One induces the idea of specific virtues (largely, through an exercise of non-discursive reason) and then deduces how to apply these ideas to particular circumstances. (Some scholars make a strict distinction between “virtue” (areté) understood as the mental capacity which induces moral ideas and “phronesis” understood as the mental capacity which applies these ideas, but the basic structure of moral thinking remains the same however strictly or loosely we define these two terms.)

Figure 3

The Inductive-Deductive Method of Aristotelian Ethics

We can distinguish then between moral induction and moral deduction. In moral induction, we induce an idea of courage, honesty, loyalty, and so on. We do this over time, beginning in our childhood, through habit and upbringing. Aristotle writes that the successful moral agent “must be born with an eye, as it were, by which to judge rightly and choose what is truly good.” (Ibid., VI.7.1114b6ff.) Once this intuitive capacity for moral discernment has been sufficiently developed—once the moral eye is able to see the difference between right and wrong,—we can apply moral norms to the concrete circumstances of our own lives. In moral deduction, we go on to apply the idea of a specific virtue to a particular situation. We do not do this by formulating moral arguments inside our heads, but by making reasonable decisions, by doing what is morally required given the circumstances. Aristotle refers, in this connection, to the practical syllogism which results “in a conclusion which is an action.” (Movement of Animals, 701a10ff, Farquharson.) Consider a (somewhat simplified) example. Suppose I induce the idea of promise-keeping as a virtue and then apply it to question of whether I should pay back the money I borrowed from my brother. The corresponding theoretical syllogism would be: Promise-keeping is good; giving back the money I owe my brother is an instance of promise-keeping; so giving the back the money I owe my brother is good.” In the corresponding practical syllogism, I do not conclude with a statement: “this act is good.” I go out and pay back the money I owe my brother. The physical exchange of money counts as the conclusion. In Aristotle’s moral system, general moral principles play the role of an ostensible definition in science. One induces a general principle and deduces a corresponding action. Aristotle does believe that moral reasoning is a less rigorous form of reasoning than science, but chiefly because scientific demonstrations deal with universals whereas the practical syllogism ends a single act that must be fitted to contingent circumstances. There is never any suggestion that morality is somehow arbitrary or subjective. One could set out the moral reasoning process using the moral equivalent of an inductive syllogism and a scientific demonstration.

Although Aristotle provides a logical blueprint for the kind of reasoning that is going on in ethical decision-making, he obviously does not view moral decision-making as any kind of mechanical or algorithmic procedure. Moral induction and deduction represent, in simplified form, what is going on. Throughout his ethics, Aristotle emphasizes the importance of context. The practice of morality depends then on a faculty of keen discernment that notices, distinguishes, analyzes, appreciates, generalizes, evaluates, and ultimately decides. In the Nicomachean Ethics, he includes practical wisdom in his list of five intellectual virtues. (Scholarly commentators variously explicate the relationship between the moral and the intellectual virtues.) Aristotle also discusses minor moral virtues such as good deliberation (eubulia), theoretical moral understanding (sunesis), and experienced moral judgement (gnome). And he equates moral failure with chronic ignorance or, in the case of weakness of will (akrasia), with intermittent ignorance.

17. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Complete Works of Aristotle. Edited by Jonathan Barnes. Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1984.
- The standard scholarly collection of translations.
Aristotle in 23 Volumes. Cambridge, M.A.: Harvard University Press; London: William Heinemann Ltd., 1944 and 1960.
- A scholarly, bilingual edition.

b. Secondary Sources

This list is intended as a window on a diversity of approaches and problems.

Barnes, Jonathan, (Aristotle) Posterior Analytics. Oxford: Clarendon Press; New York : Oxford University Press, 1994.
Biondi, Paolo. Aristotle: Posterior Analytics II.19. Quebec, Q.C.: Les Presses de l’Universite Laval, 2004.
Ebbesen, Sten, Commentators and Commentaries on Aristotle’s Sophistici Elenchi, Vol. 1: The Greek Tradition. Leiden: Brill, 1981.
Engberg-Pedersen, Troels. “More on Aristotelian Epagoge.” Phronesis, 24 (1979): 301-319.
Englebretsen, George. Three Logicians: Aristotle, Leibnitz, and Sommers and the Syllogistic. Assen, Netherlands: Van Gorcum, 1981.
- See also Sommers, below.
Garrett, Dan, and Edward Barbanell. Encyclopedia of Empiricism. Westport, Conn.: Greenwood Press, 1997.
Govier, Trudy. Problems in Argument Analysis and Evaluation. Providence, R.I.: Floris, 1987.
Groarke, Louis. “A Deductive Account of Induction,” Science et Esprit, 52 (December 2000), 353-369.
Groarke, Louis. An Aristotelian Account of Induction: Creating Something From Nothing. Montreal & Kingston: McGill-Queen’s University Press, 2009.
Hamlyn, D. W. Aristotle’s De Anima Books II and III. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1974.
Hamlyn, D. W. “Aristotelian Epagoge.” Phronesis 21 (1976): 167-184.
Irwin, Terence. Aristotle’s First Principles. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988.
Keyt, David. “Deductive Logic,” in A Companion to Aristotle, George Anaganostopoulos, London: Blackwell, 2009, pp. 31-50.
Łukasiewicz, Jan. Aristotle’s Syllogistic from the Standpoint of Modern Formal Logic. Oxford University Press, 1957.
McCaskey, John, “Freeing Aristotelian Epagôgê from Prior Analytics II 23,” Apeiron, 40:4 (December, 2007), pp. 345–74.
McKirahan, Richard Jr. Principles and Proofs: Aristotle’s Theory of Demonstrative Species. Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1992.
Parry, William, and Edward Hacker. Aristotelian Logic. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 1991.
Peters, F. E., Greek Philosophical Terms: A Historical Lexicon. New York: NYU Press, 1967.
Rijk, Lambertus Marie de. Aristotle: Semantics and Ontology. Boston, M.A.: Brill, 2002.
Smith, Robin. “Aristotle on the Uses of Dialectic,” Synthese , Vol. 96, No. 3, 1993, 335-358.
Smith, Robin. Aristotle, Prior Analytics. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 1989.
Smith, Robin. “Aristotle’s Logic,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. E, Zalta. ed. Stanford, CA., 2000, 2007.
- An excellent introduction to Aristotle’s logic (with a different focus).
Smith, Robin. “Aristotle’s Theory of Demonstration,” in A Companion to Aristotle, 52-65.
Sommers, Fred, and George Englebretsen, An Invitation to Formal Reasoning: The Logic of Terms. Aldershot UK: Ashgate, 2000.

Author Information

Louis F. Groarke
Email: lgroarke@stfx.ca
St. Francis Xavier University
Canada

Michel Foucault: Ethics

The French philosopher and historian Michel Foucault (1926-1984) does not understand ethics as moral philosophy, the metaphysical and epistemological investigation of ethical concepts (metaethics) and the investigation of the criteria for evaluating actions (normative ethics), as Anglo-American philosophers do. Instead, he defines ethics as a relation of self to itself in terms of its moral agency. More specifically, ethics denotes the intentional work of an individual on itself in order to subject itself to a set of moral recommendations for conduct and, as a result of this self-forming activity or “subjectivation,” constitute its own moral being.

The classical works of Foucault’s ethics are his historical studies of ancient sexual ethics in The Use of Pleasure and The Care of the Self, in addition to the late interviews “On the Genealogy of Ethics” and “The Ethics for the Concern of Self as a Practice of Freedom.” The publication of his final three lecture courses at the Collège de France in 1982-3 considerably enhance how those texts are to be understood and provide original resources. The Hermeneutics of the Subject provides greater insight into the ancient ethics of caring for self and how Foucault perceives it in relation to the history of philosophy. Both The Government of Self and Others and The Courage of Truth – his final courses, respectively – make it manifest that he considered the ancient ethical practice of parrhesia or frank-speech central to ancient ethics and, indeed, important to his own philosophical practice.

The significance of this so-called ‘ethical turn’ for Foucault’s philosophy is displayed in the controversial terms through which he ultimately expressed the purpose of his work. He lays claim to the spirit of the tradition of critical philosophy established by Immanuel Kant, and Foucault purports to exemplify this spirit by disclosing, or telling the truth about, the historical conditions of the contingent constraints that we impose on ourselves and, in doing so, opening possibilities for autonomous ethical relations. Foucault’s claim to the spirit of critical philosophy has received, and continues to receive, criticism and considerable discussion in the scholarly literature. Of central concern are the compatibility of his claim to critical philosophy as an ethical practice and his broader views about subjectivity, and whether his critical analysis of modern ethics is meant to be merely descriptive or also evaluative.

The primary focus of this article is the nature of ethics as Foucault conceives it, and it is unpacked by discussion of his published historical studies of ancient Greek and Roman ethics. The article then considers his treatment of the ancient ethical injunction of the care of the self and parrhesia, transitioning into a presentation of, and opinions about, his alleged ethical turn and the contentious role that ethics might play in his critical philosophy.

The ‘Ethical Turn’
Morality and Ethics
The Elements of Ethical Relations
The Care of the Self
1. Caring for Oneself and Knowing Oneself
2. Parrhesia (Frank-Speech)
Ethics and Critical Philosophy
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources and Abbreviations
2. Select Secondary Sources

1. The ‘Ethical Turn’

As important as ethics becomes in Foucault’s later thought, prior to 1981 he rarely touches on themes directly related to either ethics or morality. One rare, short, but not unimportant analysis occurs in The Order of Things. There, Foucault maintains that modern ethical thought attempts to derive moral obligations from human nature and yet modern thought also holds that human nature can never be, given the fact of human finitude, fully given to human knowledge. Consequently, modern thought is incapable of coherently formulating a set of moral obligations (OT 326-7; see also PPC 49). This argument is, essentially, one piece of his larger attack on modern humanism and its conception of the human being as subject, a being that supplies for itself the foundations of knowledge, value, and freedom. Discipline and Punish and the first volume of The History of Sexuality further this line of criticism, insisting on the historical constitution of the subject by discursive practices and techniques of power (see, for example, FL 67, PK 117, EW3 3-4, DP 30). In short, his writings through the 1970’s comprise a multifaceted attack on the modern notion of self-constitution.

It is surprising to many commentators, then, that by 1982 Foucault elaborated a framework for his work that grants self-constitution considerable importance. He explains his “history of thought” as a history of “focal points of experience,” the persistently occurring ways in which humans conceive and perceive themselves – as mad, diseased, sexual, and so forth. These focal points are studied along three axes: the axis of knowledge, or the rules of discursive practices that determine what counts as true or false; the axis of power, or the rationalities and techniques by which one governs the conduct of others; and the axis of ethics, or the practices of self through which an individual constitutes itself as a subject (GSO 1-5). Richard Bernstein aptly characterizes the scholarly reaction to Foucault’s introduction of ethics when the former states the ethical thematic seems to presume the concept of a self-constituting subject that latter’s earlier work sought to criticize (Bernstein 1994; see also Milchman and Rosenberg 2007).

Foucault never did articulate a clear position on the conceptual fit between his critique of the modern subject and his account of ethics. Nevertheless, he does provide some clues as to the nature of his mature position. Late in his life he admits that his earlier work was too insistent on the formation of subjectivity by discursive practices and power-relations (EW1 177, 225). Now, his focus is on the subject as both constituted and self-constituting, or the point at which discursive practices and power-relations dovetail with ethics. Of course, this does not decisively resolve the problem, but it does suggest a rereading of his earlier works more conducive to the notion of self-constitution. In fact, in later writings and interviews Foucault supports this interpretation when he explains that all the axes of analysis existed in a confused manner (EW1 262); he even retrospectively interprets his work as fitting one or more of those axes (EW1 202-5). By admitting that, first, all three axes of analysis existed in earlier works, and, second, that the goal of his work is to study the connection of knowledge and power with ethics, Foucault suggests that there is no ethical turn. Of course, this does not license the commentator to avoid the potentially problematic conceptual fit between Foucault’s mature conception of subjectivity and his earlier critique of the self-constituting subject. However, it does appear to be the case that Foucault is suggesting that he is best read backwards rather than forwards.

Whatever the case may be, Foucault’s introduction of ethics added an undeniable richness to his thought that also transformed how his earlier work is to be interpreted.

2. Morality and Ethics

The most elaborate discussion of ethics that Foucault provides appears in Section Three of the Introduction to The Use of Pleasure. There, he designates ethics as one of the three primary areas of morality. In addition to ethics, morality consists of both a moral code and the concrete acts of moral agents. The former consists of the more or less explicitly formulated values and rules recommended to individuals by the “prescriptive agencies” (for example, family, church, work, and so forth) in which they participate. The latter refers to the actions of historically real persons insofar as those actions comply or fail to comply with, obey or resist, or respect or disrespect the values and rules prescribed to them by prescriptive agencies.

In addition to a moral code and the real behaviors of individuals, Foucault claims that morality also consists of a third area, namely, ethics. He commonly and pithily defines it as a relation of the subject to itself, but a more technical definition of ethics is the conduct required of an individual so as to render its own actions consistent with a moral code and standards of moral approval. For Foucault, conduct is a category that is broader than moral agency and includes both non-moral actions and the exercising of non-agential capacities (for example, attitudes, demeanor, and so forth). Ethical conduct, then, consists of the actions performed and capacities exercised intentionally by a subject for the purpose of engaging in morally approved conduct. Suppose, for example, that an individual adopts the prescription of sexual fidelity to her partner. In this case, ethics concerns not her morally satisfactory conduct that directly satisfies her duty of being faithful to her partner, but rather the conduct through which she enables or brings herself to behave in a way that is sexually faithful to her partner.

Consistent with his distinction between moral conduct and ethical conduct, Foucault also distinguishes between moral obligations and ethical obligations. A moral obligation is an imperative of a moral code that either requires or forbids a specific kind of conduct, whereas an ethical obligation is a prescription for conduct that is a necessary condition for producing morally approved conduct. Foucault understands morally approved conduct to be a wide category, as it does not designate just those acts that comply with a moral code – which is, he thinks, a manifestly modern conception of moral approval. As he is keen to show in his volumes on ancient sexuality, rigorously stylizing one’s daily existence according to self-imposed standards of conduct was at one time the measure of moral approval, and such approval was not limited to conformity to a moral code. In this regard, the moral valorization of conduct might be, as it was with the ancients, weighted toward the satisfaction of ethical obligations, or, as it is in modernity, weighted toward the satisfaction of the moral obligations that comprise a moral code.

3. The Elements of Ethical Relations

On Foucault’s account, ethical relations are constituted by four formal elements, the contents of which are subject to historical variation: the ontological element or “ethical substance,” the deontological element or “mode of subjection,” the ascetic element or “ethical work,” and the teleological element or “telos.” His project in The Use of Pleasure and The Care of the Self is to articulate the sexual ethics in ancient Greece and Rome, respectively, by describing these elements and uncovering the primary ethical obligations for sexual conduct for both epochs. These ethical obligations are, Foucault contends, deducible by analyzing the four primary themes of sexual austerity expressed throughout all of Western history: the relation one has to one’s own body and health, wives and marriage, boys, and truth. Although these themes are occasionally mentioned below, the the focus of this section is on the four elements of ethical relations.

a. The Ethical Substance (Ontology)

The ethical substance is the material or aspect of self that is morally problematic, taken as the object of one’s ethical reflection, and transformed in one’s ethical work. In The Use of Pleasure Foucault maintains that the ethical substance of ancient Greek sexual ethics – an ethics that was exclusively for men of the right inherited social status – was the aphrodisia or the broad range of acts, gestures, and contacts associated with pleasures to promote the propagation of the species and considered the inferior pleasures given their commonality with all animals. The intensity of the aphrodisia induced the majority of men to behave immoderately with regard to it, and since the moral telos of ancient Greek ethics was a moderate state in which a man had succeeded in mastering his pleasures, the immoderate man was considered by ethicists to be shameful and dishonorable for allowing the inferior part of his soul to enslave his superior part. It was also considered shameful for a man to experiment or delight in pleasures derived from the passive and subordinate rather than active and dominant role in sexual relations, the latter assigned by nature to men and the former assigned to those incapable of mastering themselves of their own power, namely, women and children. By violating these limits out of a failure to master himself, the Greek man put himself in the position of compromising his health, household, social standing, and political ambitions.

Foucault maintains in The Care of the Self that aphrodisia remains the ethical substance for Roman sexual ethics. But unlike the Greek ethicists before them, Roman ethicists conceived the aphrodisia as essentially and intrinsically dangerous rather than dangerous merely because of the fact that their intensity induces immoderate conduct. According to Foucault, Roman ethicists stipulated that although sexual acts are good by nature, since nature is perfect in its designs, those acts are nevertheless fraught with a dangerous and essential passivity that causes involuntary movements of the body and soul and expenditure of the life forces. Nature has, as it were, designed sex as good and beneficial but only on the condition that it conforms to its designs. Thus, although sexual acts themselves were not considered intrinsically bad, when one performed a sexual act without adequate attention to both its dangers and nature’s limits for it one risked exposing both body and soul to illnesses; indeed, acting without consideration for these dangers was a sign that the soul had already been corrupted. Foucault therefore asserts that the perception of the dangerous physical and spiritual effects of unrestrained sexual activity led to a moral and medical discourse about sex different in kind than that of ancient Greek ethical discourse. It focused more on moderated use as a means of achieving physical and spiritual health rather than excellence.

b. Mode of Subjection (Deontology)

The mode of subjection is the way in which the individual establishes its relation to the moral code, recognizes itself as bound to act according to it, and is entitled to view its acts as worthy of moral valorization. The mode of subjection is, as Foucault refers to it, the ‘deontological’ or normative component of ethics. For example, consider the obligation to help someone in need. The Kantian holds that pure practical reason vis-à-vis the categorial imperative rationally requires the charitable act and it is praiseworthy to the extent that it is performed out of respect for reason. The practitioner of Islam, on the other hand, holds that the charitable act is morally valorized to the extent that it is produced out of respect for God’s will as revealed in sacred texts.

The mode of subjection for the ancient Greeks was a man’s free, permanent, and noble choice to fashion his life into a beautiful work according to a program of self-mastery. The notion of use (of pleasures) was what ancient Greeks used as a standard for measuring the beauty of a man’s work with regard to his sexual conduct. The use of pleasures refers to how a man managed or integrated pleasures into his life such that their use did not compromise but benefitted his health and social standing. Appropriate management submitted the use of pleasures to three strategies. The strategy of need demanded that desires for pleasures should arise from nature alone and be fulfilled neither extravagantly nor as a result of artifice. The strategy of timeliness required the distribution of pleasures at the right times of the day, year, and life so as to maintain the well-being of oneself, one’s wife, and potential offspring. The strategy of status demanded that a man use his pleasures consistent with his inherited status, purposes, and responsibilities.

Foucault maintains that ancient Greek sexual ethics was stricter than their moral code, as a man suffered little moral condemnation for his choice of sexual relations, provided he was neither passive nor partnered with someone under another man’s authority. But submitting oneself to this mode of subjection meant imposing ethical requirements on oneself that were not included in the moral code. In fact, submitting oneself to this rigorous sexual ethics was seen as a noble and fine choice precisely because it was not morally required.

The mode of subjection for ancient Roman sexual ethics is also an aesthetics of existence, but Foucault is also clear that it is more austere than the Greek ethics that preceded it. What this means is that Roman ethical obligations became stricter despite a loose moral code regarding sex. The increased austerity of this ethics is due in part to the perception of an intrinsic passivity of sexual acts, and also because the means of responding to this passivity required greater attention to the rationality of nature (which is not be understood according to the distinction between what is normal and abnormal). Roman ethicists conceived that the pleasures of sex were derived by involuntary and dangerous movements of the body and soul, and that seeking pleasure as the end of an act only furthered the possibility of corrupting both body and soul. Since for Roman ethicists nothing in nature seeks sexual pleasure as an end but only as a means to other natural goods (for example, procreation, health, spiritual well-being), they maintained that the pursuit of the aphrodisia as an end in itself could arise only from the distortion of the soul’s desires for pleasure. Consequently, the criterion by which Roman ethicists evaluated sexual conduct was whether it was born of desire conformed to the wisdom of nature. So, where the mode of subjection of ancient Greek sexual ethics was the use of pleasures, where proper use is exemplified as the strategic integration of the pleasures into one’s life, Roman ethicists understood that nature put universal features into the aphrodisia that were also the key to discovering the prescriptions for their use.

c. Ethical Work (Ascetics)

The ethical work consists of the self-forming activities meant to ensure one’s own subjection to a moral authority and transform oneself into an autonomous ethical agent. Foucault refers to these self-forming activities as practices or technologies of the self, and also in the ancient sense of askēsis, or ascetic practices. These practices are not to be conflated with an asceticism that strives for the goal of freeing oneself from all desires for physical pleasures. To be sure, all ascetic practices are, Foucault thinks, organized around principles of self-restraint, self-discipline, and self-denial. But not all ascetic practices aim at eliminating all of one’s desires for physical pleasures.

Foucault maintains that the ethical work to be performed in ancient sexual ethics is that of self-mastery. For the ancient Greeks, mastering oneself is an agonistic battle with oneself, where victory is achieved through careful use of the pleasures according to need, timeliness, and social status. Greek ethicists understood that this battle required regular training in addition to the knowledge of the things to which one ought to be attracted. The sort of training a man undertook was aimed at self-mastery through practices of self-denial and abstention, which taught him to satisfy natural needs at the right time consistent with his social status. The moral end of such practices was not to cultivate the attitude that abstention is a moral ideal, but rather to train him to become temperate and self-controlled. As such, successful self-mastery was exhibited by the man who did not suppress his desires, but authoritatively controlled them in a way that contributed to his excellence and the beauty of his life. Foucault suggests that this ideal is exemplified in the literature about the love of boys, which heroized the man who could express and maintain friendly love for a boy while at the same restraining his co-present erotic love

Foucault is clear in The Care of the Self that the ethical work in ancient Roman ethics is also self-mastery, and that the ethicists reconceived the nature of this kind of ethical work. Instead of an agonistic relationship in which a man struggles to subdue and enslave his desires for pleasures (rather than be subdued and enslaved by them) through their proper use, the work of self-mastery for Roman ethics was forcing the desires for pleasures into proper alignment with the designs of nature. While the same is true for ancient Greek ethics, the Roman ethicists emphasized it to such a degree that social status and, to an extent, sexual anatomy were abolished as being relevant factors in determining one’s ethical duties. What becomes essential for this ethics is grasping that all pleasures that are not internal to oneself originate in desires that might not be capable of satisfaction, and whenever one chooses to engage such desires one subjects oneself to physical and spiritual risk. In all things regarding the aphrodisia, then, careful attention must be paid to deciphering and testing which of one’s desires originate in nature, or maintain a consistency with nature, and which transgress the limits set by nature.

The intensification of the austerity of sexual ethics this change in self-mastery produced is emphasized in marital ethics. Greek men were not morally required to maintain sexual relations with only their wives, but a man’s sexual conduct was especially excellent when he restrained his sexual activity to his wife. For the Roman ethicists, however, a man failed to master himself if he pursued sexual relations with anyone other than his wife, for nature designed the man and woman to contribute to each other’s physical and spiritual well-being through their sexual activity together. Their joint spiritual well-being was considered integral to the harmony of the human community.

d. Telos (Teleology)

The telos of an ethics is the ideal mode or state of being toward which one strives or aspires in their ethical work. For the ancient Greeks the activity of self-mastery aimed at a state of moderation that was characterized as freedom in its fullest form, and it was understood as a man’s enslavement of his desires for pleasures to himself. A man’s domination of his desires was expressed in domestic and political metaphors: he must exhibit the constrained strategizing necessary for maintaining an orderly and stable rule over both his household or subordinates. The man who controlled his use of pleasures made himself personally prosperous – physically excellent and socially estimable – in the same way that a household or nation prospers as the result of the careful and skilled governance of a manager or ruler, and a man was not expected to be successful in managing his household or exercising political authority and influence without first achieving victory over his pleasures. The man who failed to master his pleasures and yet found himself in a position of authority over others was a candidate for tyranny, while the man who mastered his pleasures was considered the best candidate to govern.

Roman ethicists conceived the activity of self-mastery as aiming at a conversion of the self to itself, which they conceived as freedom in fullest form. Through the ethical work of self-mastery an individual conformed their desires to the rationality of nature, which resulted in a detachment from anything not given by nature as an appropriate object of desire. Roman ethicists did not understand the telos of self-mastery as the authority over pleasures that manifested itself in their strategic use, but rather it manifested itself as a disinterestedness and detachment from the pleasures such that one finds a non-physical, spiritual pleasure in belonging to the true self nature intends. Nature does not recommend the mere pursuit of pleasures; it recommends the pursuit of pleasures insofar as those acts are consistent with other ends that it wants met. Hence, the end of self-mastery is achieving a perfect consistency between one’s own desires and those that nature uses to promote its ends. For this reason the freedom achieved through self-mastery is an autonomy with regard to that which is within one’s control, namely, conforming oneself to nature.

4. The Care of the Self

A major theme that emerges in Foucault’s final volumes of The History of Sexuality and his lectures at the Collège de France is the ethical obligation to care for oneself. Foucault certainly claims in both those volumes that the care of self is foundational to ancient ethics (UP 73, 108, 211; CS 45-54), but curiously, and despite his titling of the third volume The Care of the Self, he does not provide significant discussion of the care of self in its generality. Yet his final three lecture courses at the Collège de France attest to the fact that not only did he have a definite view about the care of the self, it is central to the history of philosophy and critical philosophy that he articulated at the end of his life. This history emphasizes the integral relation between the care of self and the concern for truth, notably on display in the practice of parrhesia (frank-speech), as its central mode of expression.

a. Caring for Oneself and Knowing Oneself

The ancient notion of caring for oneself acquires prominence for Foucault in the first lecture of his 1981-2 course lecture at the Collège de France, The Hermeneutics of the Subject. For the ancients, Foucault claims, the care of the self was the foundational principle of all moral rationality. Today, however, caring for oneself is without moral content. By explaining the ancient conception of the care of the self and its connection to the Delphic prescription to know oneself, famously observed by Socrates, Foucault wishes to diagnose the exclusion of the care of the self by modern thought and consider whether, given his diagnosis, the care of the self might remain viable in modern ethics.

The exclusion of the care of the self is the result of a reconception of two ancient injunctions: care for oneself and know oneself. These two injunctions were originally expressed by Socrates – the exemplar par excellence, Foucault thinks, of the person who cares for himself – with the care of the self serving as the justification for the prescription to know oneself. According to Foucault, Socrates and ancient ethicists understood that caring for oneself was to exhibit an attitude not only toward oneself but also toward others and the world, attend to one’s own thoughts and attitudes in self-reflection and meditation, and engage in ascetic practices aimed at realizing an ideal state of being. The prescription to know oneself was the means through which one cared for oneself, and Socrates cared for his own soul and the souls of others by using the practice of dialectic to force the examination of the truth of his own thought and conduct and that of his interlocutors. The salient point for Foucault is that Socrates did not practice philosophy merely as a means of arriving at true propositions. Instead, his program was to use philosophy as a tool for examining and testing the consistency of the rational discourse he and his interlocutors employed to justify their lives and conduct. Foucault sees this as a philosophical activity that is fundamentally oriented to the care of the self, for truth is pursued in philosophy for its own good and the sake of ethical development. Philosophy is by Socrates’ lights a practice essential to one’s ethical development, for it is a spiritual commitment to the truth that requires self-disciplined attention to the character of one’s thinking.

Foucault therefore distinguishes between philosophy simpliciter and philosophy as a spiritual activity. Philosophy considers what enables, conditions, and limits the subject’s access to the truth. But philosophy as a spiritual activity – or philosophy undertaken according to the injunction to care for oneself – is philosophy conceived as ethical work that must be performed in order for an individual to gain access to the truth. This is not to say, of course, that philosophy as a spiritual activity does not seek to acquire knowledge of things as they are. Rather, it is to say that such knowledge requires right conduct in addition to the justification of a true belief.

The injunction to know oneself was therefore a demand to attend to one’s relationship to the truth as a function of caring for oneself. A decisive change occurs, however, with the “Cartesian moment” (HS 14). The kind of self-knowledge that René Descartes seeks in his Meditations on First Philosophy and Rules for the Direction of the Mind is self-evidence or that which would decisively determine the truth or falsity of a proposition through its apparent clarity and distinctness. Now, knowing oneself becomes merely a necessary epistemic, and not moral, condition for gaining access to the truth. (The Cartesian moment takes further hold, Foucault explains, in the philosophy of Immanuel Kant, who argues in his Critique of Pure Reason that features of the subject’s own thinking must be constitutive of the very possibility of knowledge.) Consequently, attending to oneself becomes judging the truth of a proposition, and self-knowledge is not a directive for spiritual and ethical development. In modernity philosophy is, for the most part (compare HS 28, where Foucault adds some qualification), not the activity of ethical transformation that aims at the existence transformed by truth.

The modern shift in the construal of self-knowledge as self-evidence required changes in moral rationality. Modern thought construes moral self-examination as the act of determining whether one’s intentions or acts are consistent with moral obligations. One’s moral existence is therefore reduced to whether or not one satisfies one’s moral obligations, which had the consequence that the care of the self is perceived as either amoral egoism (because it is unconcerned with the foundations of moral obligation) or melancholic withdrawal (because one cannot know one’s moral obligations). But this is predicated upon a fundamental misconception of the care of the self. The care of the self is the ethical transformation of the self in light of the truth, which is to say the transformation of the self into a truthful existence.

b. Parrhesia (Frank-Speech)

In the final two years of his life, Foucault began to focus his attention on a particular ancient practice of caring for the self, namely, parrhesia (alternatively, parresia) or frank-speech. Parrhesia is the courageous act of telling the truth without either embellishment or concealment for the purpose of criticizing oneself or another. This practice and its history are the objects of his final two lecture courses at the College de France, The Government of Self and Others and The Courage of Truth, in addition to a series of lectures, “Discourse and Truth” (compiled as Fearless Speech), given at the University of California, Berkeley in the fall of 1983. The chief object of concern is parrhesia as a practice of self that is centered on the relation of the subject to truth, and how through engaging in parrhesia one freely constitutes one’s subjectivity.

Foucault stipulates that there are five features of the parrhesiastic act. First, the speaker must express his own opinion directly; that is, he must express his opinion without (or by minimizing) rhetorical flourish and make it plain that it is his opinion. Second, parrhesia requires that the speaker knows that he speaks the truth and that he speaks the truth because he knows what he says is in fact true. His expressed opinion is verified by his sincerity and courage, which points to the third feature, namely, danger: it is only when someone risks some kind of personal harm that his speech constitutes parrhesia. Fourth, the function of parrhesia is not merely to state the truth, but to state it as an act of criticizing oneself (for example, an admission) or another. Finally, the parrhesiastes speaks the truth as a duty to himself and others, which means he is free to keep silent but respects the truth by imposing upon himself the requirement to speak it as an act of freedom (FS 11-20; see also GSO 66-7).

It is in Socrates, Foucault says, that the care of the self first manifests itself as parrhesia. (But not only Socrates; Foucault considers parrhesiastic practices throughout the ancient Greek and Roman epochs.) The essence of Socratic parrhesia is located in his focus on the harmony between the way one lives (Greek: bios) and the rational discourse or account (Greek: logos) one might or might not possess that would justify the way one lives. Socrates himself lived in a way that was in perfect conformity with his statements about how one ought to live, and those statements themselves were supported by a rigorous rational discourse defending their truth. Because Socrates bound himself in his conduct to his own philosophically explored standards, his interlocutors understood him to be truly free. Socrates’ harmony is the condition of his use of parrhesia in identifying and criticizing the lack of harmony in his interlocutors, with the aim of leading them to a life in which they will bind themselves in their own conduct to only those principles that they can put into a rational discourse. Socratic parrhesia therefore manifests the care of the self because its intent is ethical, for it urges the interlocutor to pursue knowledge of what is true and conform their conduct to the truth as ethical work.

5. Ethics and Critical Philosophy

Ethics and critique emerged nearly simultaneously as objects of Foucault’s interest (1981 and 1978, respectively). Whether or not that was accidental is an interesting area of scholarship. But Foucault explicitly links them together in the much discussed essay, “What is Enlightenment?”, explaining that his project is critical philosophy precisely because it contributes to our abilities to autonomously fashion and constitute ourselves. Thus, around Kant, Foucault combines critical philosophy and ethics, and that connection provides greater insight into just how Foucault conceives of ethics and the history of ethics in relation to his own project. But his self-alignment with the tradition of critical philosophy has become the most contentious issue in the scholarship. The criticisms are diverse, but all offer some version of the thesis that Foucault either rejects or lacks the normative criteria required for critique.

a. Kant and Foucault

Late in his life Foucault often claimed to be a descendant of the tradition of critical philosophy established by Kant. However, it is evident that Foucault always maintained an interest in Kant’s philosophy, which is verified by his secondary thesis for his philosophy doctorate, a close reading of and commentary on Kant’s Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View (see Foucault 2008). Additionally, Foucault casually aligns himself rather broadly with critical philosophy in two other works from the 1960’s, The Birth of the Clinic (1963) and The Order of Things (1966) (BC xix; OT 342). The received view of this period of his work, especially the secondary thesis and The Order of Things, is that it provides decisive evidence of his rejection of Kant’s attempt to place all rational conditions and constraints in the subject (for example, see Habermas 1986, Schmidt and Wartenburg 1994, Han 2002, Allen 2003). Although Kant disappears from Foucault’s work as an object of explicit discussion, there is some indirect evidence found throughout his explicitly ethical writings that strongly suggests that the self-constituting subject is his target (see again PK 117, EW3 3-4, DP 30).

Kant reappears in Foucault’s thought in the 1978 address “What is Critique?” and he remains an object of attention until Foucault’s death in 1984. In the later work Kant is no longer discussed seemingly negatively as the philosopher that grounds thought, action, and freedom in the subject’s self-legislated laws of reason, but rather the philosopher who in his 1784 essay “What is Enlightenment?” takes aim at the ways in which human beings arbitrarily constrain themselves in their present actuality. Foucault departs from the Kantian critical project insofar as he does not seek to provide an “analytics of truth,” which would guarantee autonomous thinking and acting in universal and necessary principles (see, for example, “What Does it Mean to Orient Oneself in Thinking,” 8:145, and Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals, 4:431). Instead, he controversially claims to promote autonomy by engaging in a critical-historical ontology of the present, the purpose of which is to disclose the singular and arbitrary constraints that we impose upon ourselves so that we might, should we possess the courage, constitute ourselves differently. Or, as Foucault puts it, the goal is to determine “what is not or is no longer indispensable for the constitution of ourselves as autonomous subjects” (EW1 313). (For more locations where Foucault aligns himself with the tradition of critical philosophy see FS 169-173, GSO 1-39, PT 41-82, EW2 459).

The scholarship agrees that there is a prima facie incompatibility in Foucault’s treatment of Kant, but there is disagreement about whether it is more substantial. Jürgen Habermas (1986) maintains that Foucault’s alleged critique of the Kantian self-constituting subject cannot be squared with the conception of the self-constituting subject that emerges in his ethical writings. Allen (2003) disputes this view, maintaining that Foucault never rejects the notion of self-constitution, but rather rejects the uniquely modern conception of self-constitution as it appears in Kantian and post-Kantian philosophy. A possible alternative is presented by Norris (1994), who claims that Foucault simply does not have a consistent position on the Kantian philosophy, but that need not necessarily diminish our appreciation of his later work. (It is relevant to this discussion that Foucault himself says he is not above changing his mind. See AK 17, where Foucault famously responds to critics about his perceived shiftiness by asserting his right to change his mind, which is echoed later in his life at UP 8-9. See also EW1 177, 225, and FL 465, where admits to changing his views about power and other concepts.)

b. Critique and Parrhesia

The recent publication of Foucault’s lecture courses on parrhesia provide further material for his connection to the critical tradition. In his conclusion to his lectures at Berkeley on parrhesia Foucault very clearly connects parrhesia to the Kantian tradition of critical philosophy. He invokes again the distinction between two traditions of philosophy: the analytics of truth and the critical tradition. Instead of explaining the former as being merely Cartesian and Kantian, he explains it as a concern with the correct processes of reasoning in determining whether a statement is true (thus, Descartes and Kant exemplify a certain kind of analytics of truth, namely, that which grounds truth in the subject). On the other side is the critical tradition that is concerned with why it is important to tell the truth and who is entitled to speak it. He then goes on to say that the seminar on parrhesia is a part of his “genealogy of the critical attitude in Western philosophy” (FS 170), thus aligning parrhesia with Kantian critical philosophy. In doing so Foucault establishes that his critical philosophy is a practice of parrhesia in a similar manner to the Kantian practice of parrhesia. In “What is Enlightenment?” Kant engages in parrhesia when he encourages his contemporaries to use their own reason, consistent with universal law, of course, and refuse to merely rely on the authority of others, including the authority of the monarchy and state, as a guide to their use of reason (however, one must privately obey institutional authorities while publicly expressing one’s disagreement with them). Foucault understands his own critical activity as a form of parrhesia in a sense similar to that which Kant exemplifies in the essay on enlightenment. Disclosing the historicity and arbitrariness of the previously unquestioned constraints that we impose on ourselves is, Foucault thinks, a parrhesiastic act. Determining their precise relations is at the heart of interpreting the nature and scope of Foucault’s critical project. For more, see Flynn 1987, O’Leary 2002, McGushin 2007, and the ensuing subsection.

c. Parrhesia and Self-Legislation

Ethics, Foucault says, is the form that freedom takes when it is informed by reflection, and by this he means that freedom consists in reflectively informed ascetic practices or practices of self. These informed practices are imbued with an attitude, ethos, or relationship to one’s ethical substance that Foucault understands as the activity of freedom (EW1 284). One reason that he focused on ethical work, then, is to discover how human beings freely make themselves into moral subjects of their own conduct through techniques or practices of self-restraint and self-discipline.

In The Government of Self and Others Foucault construes parrhesia as free practice of self par excellence. “Parrēsia,” Foucault says, “is the free courage by which one binds oneself in the act of telling the truth. Or again, parrhesia is the ethics of truth-telling as an action which is risky and free” (GSO 66). The language that Foucault uses to describe parrhesiastic freedom throughout this lecture hour is incredibly suggestive of its source: it is the language of Kantian self-legislation. For Kant, autonomy does not consist in giving oneself the moral law, since the moral law is a necessity of the rational will; rather, autonomy consists in binding oneself to the law by freely conforming one’s conduct to it (see, for example, Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals 4:31). This connection suggests that Foucault understands parrhesia as the supreme act of self-legislation and autonomy, where truth rather than moral law plays the normative role – a point already suggested in Foucault’s claims about the original meaning of the care of the self. That is to say, it seems that the truth is for Foucault a moral value or a good one ought to pursue. Parrhesia is the supreme act of self-legislation because the risk and danger involved in the act tests one’s self-discipline and courage in their commitment to the truth.

This casts more light on Foucault’s representation of his project as critical. Because autonomy is conceived as binding oneself to the truth, truth becomes the practical goal of Foucaultian critique. This would entail that one is to pursue the truth in both its propositional and non-propositional (or existential forms) as the highest practice of self.

d. The Problem of Normativity and the Aesthetics of Existence

The chief objection to Foucault’s self-alignment with the critical tradition is not focused on his reading of Kant, but whether he has the philosophical resources to support a properly critical philosophy. When Kant engages in parrhesia by exhorting his peers to use their own reason he is not issuing merely an exhortation, but, per his moral philosophy, he is telling them that their own practical reason obligates the use of reason consistent with universal law. In this regard, Kant’s parrhesia flows from, and his use of critique is grounded in, his analytics of truth. But Foucault intentionally steers clear of that project, which raises questions about the legitimacy and force of his critical philosophy. Now, while criticisms of Foucault’s philosophy are diverse (see especially Taylor 1986, Habermas 1986, Bernstein 1994, and Fraser 1994), a common complaint is that he owes his readers some explanation for why one ought to accept his evaluations of modern ethics.

But it is not at all obvious that Foucaultian critical philosophy is – despite the use of the term ‘critique’ – in the business of evaluation. It is true, as Bernstein (1994) points out, that Foucault very often uses a value-laden rhetoric. However, it is also true that his project is critical in the peculiar sense of the unmasking of some previously concealed practice or aspect of some practice as an activity of frank-speech. His rhetoric is therefore charged not because he has some hidden normative criteria already in hand (as Habermas 1990 alleges), but because, for example, certain individuals operate in a practice (say, penitential practices) under false opinions about its supposed noble goals (for example, defending society). To this end Foucault need only unmask the tensions and inconsistencies in a practice through his historical labors to make his project critical.

While such a maneuver is consistent with a purely descriptive interpretation of Foucault’s critical philosophy, there is a palpable sense in which he goes beyond mere unmasking to recommendation. For example, in an interview from 1984, “An Aesthetics of Existence,” Foucault states that moral approval (or mode of subjection) conceived merely as obedience to a moral code is not only disappearing but has disappeared, and “to this absence of morality corresponds, must correspond, the search for an aesthetics of existence” (PPC 49; see also OT 326-7). On the one hand, this appears to be a descriptive, historical statement of a matter of fact, namely, that the nature of moral approval has changed. On the other hand, some commentators (O’Leary 2002) interpret such statements as evaluations of modern ethics and recommendations for an alternative standard of moral approval exemplified by an aesthetics of existence. There is no doubt that Foucault commends those who might undertake an aesthetics or arts of existence (EW1 261), or those who voluntarily and rigorously elaborate their existence according to a set of self-imposed standards that aim at what they take to be the good, fine, and beautiful life. It is unclear, however, if Foucault is merely commending or also recommending an aesthetics of existence. Foucault’s critics see no binding or authoritative reason why one ought to pursue an aesthetics of existence instead of, say, egoism unless one has the resources for sorting out good, fine, and beautiful things. For this reason, critics (see Thacker 1993 in addition to those noted above) who interpret Foucault as recommending the aesthetics of existence find it to be an insufficiently articulated alternative to the alleged decline of modern morality.

Additionally, some criticism of Foucault’s ethical thought is based on a reading that empties the aesthetics of existence of its robust moral content. While Foucault does not always help himself out in playing up that content (see EW1 261), it is worth paying attention to the fact that an aesthetics of existence heeds the ancient injunction to care for oneself. This means it is ethically oriented by the care of the self and truth, such that one ought to fashion oneself in accordance with the life that one could reasonably maintain is truly fine and beautiful, and also that the practitioner of an aesthetics of existence demands of others, as he or she demands of himself or herself, that they provide a rational discourse for the life that they believe to be truly fine and beautiful. So, while Foucault is careful to say that a return to ancient Greek ethics – a male-oriented, class-centered ethics – is neither a solution to contemporary moral problems nor a remedy to the alleged decline of modern morality – and indeed expresses pessimism about its prospects (HS 251-2) – an aesthetics of existence properly reformulated to modernity might prove worthy of consideration as a mode of subjection. In the end, however, Foucault supplies only interesting suggestions and nothing too concrete. For this reason this area of Foucault’s thought, and its critical scope, remains hotly debated and a fruitful area of research. For a wide range of essays dealing with the manifold of issues related to ethics and critical philosophy in Foucault’s thought, see Norris 1994, Kelly ed. 1994, Ashenden and Owen ed. 1999, O’Leary 2002, and McGushin 2007.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources and Abbreviations

Foucault, Michel. The Order of Things: An Archaeology of the Human Sciences. New York: Vintage Books, 1970 (OT).
- Chapters 7 and 9 are important for Foucault’s interpretation of modernity, including modern morality, and especially for his much discussed interpretation of Kant’s critical philosophy.
Foucault, Michel. The Archaeology of Knowledge and The Discourse on Language, trans. A. M. Sheridan Smith. New York: Pantheon Books, 1972 (AK).
- Foucault lays out the structure of his archaeological method in both texts.
Foucault, Michel. The Birth of the Clinic: An Archaeology of Medical Perception, trans. A. M. Sheridan Smith. New York: Vintage Books, 1973 (BC).
- Foucault examines the genesis of modern medical perception and experience, which he characterizes in the Preface as both historical and critical.
Foucault, Michel. Discipline and Punish: The Birth of the Prison, trans. Alan Sheridan. New York: Vintage Books, 1977 (DP).
- This book is primarily about modern penitential practices, which Foucault understands as one of the most important practices to develop, not coincidentally, at the same time as reform and liberation discourses.
Foucault, Michel. Power/Knowledge: Selected Interviews and Other Writings, 1972-1977, ed. Colin Gordon. New York: Pantheon Books, 1980 (PK).
- This volume contains some of Foucault’s most controversial claims about the interrelations of power of knowledge and the nature of truth – claims that might be helpfully interpreted in light of his turn to ethics.
Foucault, Michel. The History of Sexuality, vol. 3: The Care of the Self, trans. Robert Hurley. New York: Vintage Books, 1988 (CS).
- Part Two, “The Cultivation of the Self,” gives an outline of Roman ethics. The rest of the text explores changes in ancient Roman ethics and the intensification of the problematization of the aphrodisia, focusing on increased austerity in bodily health, marriage, and the love of boys.
Foucault, Michel. Philosophy, Politics, Culture: Interviews and Other Writings of Michel Foucault, ed. Lawrence D. Kritzman. New York: Routledge, 1988 (PPC).
- A collection of writings and interviews.
Foucault, Michel. The History of Sexuality, vol. 2: The Use of Pleasure, trans. Robert Hurley. New York: Vintage Books, 1990 (UP).
- Chapter Three of the Introduction is the most lucid presentation of his theory of ethics. Chapter One is also noteworthy because it offers some insight into Foucault’s critical-historical project.
Foucault, Michel. Foucault Live (Interviews, 1961-1984), ed. Sylvère Lotringer. New York: Semiotext(e), 1996 (FL).
- A collection of interviews spanning Foucault’s career. Some of the early interviews in this volume contain some of Foucault’s strongest critical rhetoric about the subject.
Foucault, Michel. The Essential Works of Michel Foucault, vol. 1: Ethics: Subjectivity and Truth, ed. Paul Rabinow. New York: The New Press, 1997 (EW1).
- Items of special note in this volume are “On the Genealogy of Ethics: An Overview of Work in Progress” (253-280), “The Ethics of the Concern for Self as a Practice of Freedom” (281-302), and “What is Enlightenment?” (303-320).
Foucault, Michel. The Essential Works of Michel Foucault, vol. 2: Aesthetics, Method, and Epistemology, ed. James D. Faubion. New York: The New Press, 1998 (EW2).
- The essay, “Foucault,” penned in part pseudonymously by Foucault himself, is worth mentioning because he provides an overview of his work in addition to straightforward statements about his affiliation with the Kantian tradition of critical philosophy.
Foucault, Michel. The Essential Works of Michel Foucault, vol. 3: Power, ed. James Faubion. New York: The New Press, 2000 (EW3).
- The essay “The Subject and Power” is perhaps Foucault’s clearest presentation of his view on power-relations and it is relevant to those interested in his ethics.
Foucault, Michel. Fearless Speech, ed. Joseph Pearson. Los Angeles: Semiotext(e), 2001 (FS).
- Foucault covers political parrhesia in the writings of Euripides, Platonic texts on Socratic and philosophical parrhesia, and parrhesia in the Epicureans and Cynics.
Foucault, Michel. The Hermeneutics of the Subject: Lectures at the Collège de France 1981-1982, trans. Graham Burchell. New York: Palgrave MacMillan, 2005 (HS).
- This lecture course, especially the very first lecture, is crucial to the development of Foucault’s conception of ethics and his understanding of the history of ethics.
Foucault, Michel. The Politics of Truth, ed. Sylvère Lotringer. Los Angeles: Semiotext(e), 2007 (PT).
- This volume contains the important 1978 address, “What is Critique?”, which is the first indication of Foucault’s shift of focus from power to ethics, although it is not clearly articulated as such. It is also noteworthy because it is Foucault’s first extended discussion of Kant’s essay “What is Enlightenment?”
Foucault, Michel. Introduction to Kant’s Anthropology, trans. Roberto Nigro and Kate Biggs. Los Angeles: Semiotext(e), 2008.
- Through a reading of Kant’s Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View and its contextualization with the critical philosophy, Foucault suggests that Kantian philosophical anthropology is at the very heart of the critical philosophy.
Foucault, Michel. The Government of Self and Others: Lectures at the Collège de France 1982-1983, trans. Graham Burchell. New York: Palgrave MacMillan, 2010 (GSO).
- Foucault narrows his focus from the care of the self to parrhesia as a practice of caring for the self. Foucault devotes the first two hours to discussing primarily Kant’s essay “What is Enlightenment?” but also his discussion of revolution in The Conflict of the Faculties.
Foucault, Michel. The Courage of Truth: Lectures at the Collège de France 1983-1984, trans. Graham Burchell. New York: Palgrave MacMillan, 2011.
- Parrhesia is once again the focus of this lecture course.

b. Select Secondary Sources

Allen, Amy. “Foucault and Enlightenment: A Critical Reappraisal,” Constellations 10:2, 2003, pp. 180-198.
- Allen contends that Foucault is engaged in a critique of Kantian critique in which Foucault is said to claim that Kant designs his critical philosophy around the confused doctrine of the subject.
Ashenden, Samantha and David Owens, ed. Foucault Contra Habermas: Recasting the Dialogue Between Genealogy and Critical Theory. Thousand Oaks: SAGE Publications, Inc., 1999.
- A collection of essays on Foucault’s engagement with Habermas.
Bernstein, Richard. “Foucault: Critique as a Philosophical Ethos,” Critique and Power: Recasting the Foucault/Habermas Debate, ed. Michael Kelly, pp. 211-42. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1994.
- Not only does Bernstein do an excellent job summarizing the complaints of critics such as Habermas and Fraser, he offers some insightful worries about Foucault’s self-alignment with the critical tradition.
Davidson, Arnold I. “Archaeology, Genealogy, Ethics,” Foucault: A Critical Reader, ed. David Couzens Hoy, pp. 221-33. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 1986.
- Davidson provides a helpful overview of Foucault’s conception of ethics and situation of that conception within his archaeological and genealogical methods.
Davidson, Arnold I. “Ethics as Ascetics: Foucault, the History of Ethics, and Ancient Thought,” The Cambridge Companion to Foucault, 2^nd Edition, ed. Gary Gutting, pp. 123-148. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
- Yet another insightful treatment by Davidson of Foucault’s conception of ethics with discussion of the latter’s analysis of ancient sexuality.
Detel, Wolfgang. Foucault and Classical Antiquity: Power, Ethics and Knowledge, trans. David Wigg-Wolf. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
- A critical treatment of Foucault’s investigations of ancient ethics, including original discussion of ancient ethics, and his historical methodology.
Flynn, Thomas. “Foucault as Parrhēsiast: His Last Course at the Collège de France (1984),” The Final Foucault, ed. James Bernauer and David Rasmussen, pp. 102-18. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1988.
- A summary and clarification of Foucault’s last lecture course, The Courage of Truth, that connects it to his views about and attitude towards the enlightenment, and, given the suggested connections, how to read Foucault as a parrhēsiast.
Fraser, Nancy. “Michel Foucault: A ‘Young Conservative’?”, Critique and Power: Recasting the Foucault/Habermas Debate, ed. Michael Kelly, pp. 185-210. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1994.
- Fraser provides a helpful discussion and commentary on Habermas’ criticisms of Foucault.
Habermas, Jürgen. “Taking Aim at the Heart of the Present,” Foucault: A Critical Reader, ed. David Couzens Hoy, pp. 103-8. Cambridge: Blackwell Publishers Inc., 1986.
- Habermas maintains that not only does Foucault have an incompatible interpretation of Kant’s critical philosophy, but that he is also not entitled to engage in critical philosophy because he rejects the normative requirements of critique.
Habermas, Jürgen. The Philosophical Discourse of Modernity: Twelve Lectures, trans. Frederick G. Lawrence. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1990.
- Habermas mounts a powerful critique of Foucault’s entire thought in two lengthy chapters (Chapters Nine and Ten).
Han, Béatrice. Foucault’s Critical Project: Between the Transcendental and the Historical, trans. Edward Pile. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2002.
- Han maintains that Foucault argues that Kant is unable to maintain the distinction between the transcendental and the empirical; however, she contends that Foucault himself is unable to maintain the distinction throughout his work between the transcendental and the historical.
Kelly, Michael, ed. Critique and Power: Recasting the Foucault/Habermas Debate. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
- This volume includes writings by both Foucault and Habermas in addition to essays dealing with value-related issues in both Foucault’s thought and Habermas’.
Levy, Neil. “Foucault as Virtue Ethicist,” Foucault Studies, no. 1, 2004, pp. 20-31.
- The author maintains that Foucault’s investigations of the care of the self show that his ethical work is best understood as a virtue theoretic ethics.
McGushin, Edward F. Foucault’s Askēsis: An Introduction to the Philosophical Life. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 2007.
- McGushin weaves together the various threads of Foucault’s thought as a spiritual practice that is exercised in the criticism of the Cartesian moment and the confluence of normalizing biopolitics.
Milchman, Alan and Alan Rosenberg. “The Aesthetic and Ascetic Dimensions of an Ethics of Self-Fashioning: Nietzsche and Foucault,” Parrhesia: A Journal of Critical Philosophy, no. 2, 2007, pp. 44-65.
- This essay provides a valuable discussion of Foucault’s ‘ethical turn’ and his concept of an aesthetics of existence, including how it is related to a similar view found in the philosophy of Friedrich Nietzsche, a well-known influence on Foucault.
Norris, Christopher. “‘What is Enlightenment?’ Kant according to Foucault,” The Cambridge Companion to Foucault, 1^st Edition, ed. Gary Gutting, pp. 159-96. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994.
- Norris considers the complexity of Foucault’s conception of the subject as it appears throughout the latter’s writings and in the context of his relationship to Kant.
O’Leary, Timothy. Foucault and the Art of Ethics. London: Continuum, 2002.
- O’Leary lays out an account of Foucault’s ethics in which Foucault offers an aesthetics of existence as an alternative to the failure of modern theory to ground moral obligations. Without denying potential problems in this ethics, O’Leary maintains that its goal is self-transformation and experimentation.
Schmidt, James and Thomas Wartenberg, “Foucault’s Enlightenment: Critique, Revolution, and the Fashioning of the Self,” Critique and Power: Recasting the Foucault/Habermas Debate, ed. Michael Kelly, pp. 283-314. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1994.
- The authors consider Foucault’s reading of Kant and the former’s relationship to the enlightenment, concluding that, while Foucault is not immune from criticism, critics of his work might start with the Kantian ideas that Foucault inherits.
Sharpe, Matthew. “‘Critique’ as Technology of the Self,” Foucault Studies, no. 2, 2005, pp. 97-116.
- Sharpe posits that there is a theoretical continuity in Foucault’s thought (that is, there is no ‘ethical turn’) insofar as Foucault always maintained the value of Kantian critique as a practice of self.
Stone, Brad E. “Subjectivity and Truth,” Foucault: Key Concepts, Dianna Taylor ed., pp. 143-57. Durham: Acumen, 2011.
- The care of the self and its relation to parrhēsia is covered, in addition to exploring possibilities of caring for the self in the modern age.
Taylor, Charles. “Foucault on Freedom and Truth,” Foucault: A Critical Reader, ed. David Couzens Hoy, pp. 69-102. Cambridge: Blackwell Publishers Inc., 1986.
- Taylor argues that Foucault’s conception of power-relations assumes views of both truth and freedom that the latter rejects.
Taylor, Dianna. “Normalization and Normativity,” Foucault Studies, no. 7, 2009, pp. 45-63.
- Taylor deals with the issue of normativity in both Foucault and Habermas, maintaining that Habermas’ conception of normativity might in practice constrain (viz. normalization) rather than emancipate.
Taylor, Dianna. “Practices of the Self,” Foucault: Key Concepts, Dianna Taylor ed., pp. 173-86. Durham: Acumen, 2011.
- Taylor examines Foucault’s notion of practices of the self in the context of the Christian practice of self-sacrifice, which she contrasts with his own critical practice that, she claims, emphasizes innovative and creative practices of the self.
Thacker, Andrew. “Foucault’s Aesthetics of Existence,” Radical Philosophy, no. 63, 1993, pp. 13-21.
- Foucault’s notion of an aesthetics of existence is treated, and Thacker maintains that said notion is insufficiently articulated to stand as a criteria for personal decision-making.

Author Information

Bob Robinson
Email: robert.robinson@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

Frantz Fanon (1925—1961)

Frantz Fanon was one of a few extraordinary thinkers supporting the decolonization struggles occurring after World War II, and he remains among the most widely read and influential of these voices. His brief life was notable both for his whole-hearted engagement in the independence struggle the Algerian people waged against France and for his astute, passionate analyses of the human impulse towards freedom in the colonial context. His written works have become central texts in Africana thought, in large part because of their attention to the roles hybridity and creolization can play in forming humanist, anti-colonial cultures. Hybridity, in particular, is seen as a counter-hegemonic opposition to colonial practices, a non-assimilationist way of building connections across cultures that Africana scholar Paget Henry argues is constitutive of Africana political philosophy.

Tracing the development of his writings helps explain how and why he has become an inspirational figure firing the moral imagination of people who continue to work for social justice for the marginalized and the oppressed. Fanon’s first work Peau Noire, Masques Blancs (Black Skin, White Masks) was his first effort to articulate a radical anti-racist humanism that adhered neither to assimilation to a white-supremacist mainstream nor to reactionary philosophies of black superiority. While the attention to oppression of colonized peoples that was to dominate his later works was present in this first book, its call for a new understanding of humanity was undertaken from the subject-position of a relatively privileged Martinican citizen of France, in search of his own place in the world as a black man from the French Caribbean, living in France. His later works, notably L’An Cinq, de la Révolution Algérienne (A Dying Colonialism) and the much more well-known Les Damnés de la Terre (The Wretched of the Earth), go beyond a preoccupation with Europe’s pretensions to being a universal standard of culture and civilization, in order to take on the struggles and take up the consciousness of the colonized “natives” as they rise up and reclaim simultaneously their lands and their human dignity. It is Fanon’s expansive conception of humanity and his decision to craft the moral core of decolonization theory as a commitment to the individual human dignity of each member of populations typically dismissed as “the masses” that stands as his enduring legacy.

Biography
Africana Phenomenology
Decolonization Theory
Influences on Fanon’s Thought
Movements and Thinkers Influenced by Fanon
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Frantz Fanon was born in the French colony of Martinique on July 20, 1925. His family occupied a social position within Martinican society that could reasonably qualify them as part of the black bourgeoisie; Frantz’s father, Casimir Fanon, was a customs inspector and his mother, Eléanore Médélice, owned a hardware store in downtown Fort-de-France, the capital of Martinique. Members of this social stratum tended to strive for assimilation, and identification, with white French culture. Fanon was raised in this environment, learning France’s history as his own, until his high school years when he first encountered the philosophy of negritude, taught to him by Aimé Césaire, Martinique’s other renowned critic of European colonization. Politicized, and torn between the assimilationism of Martinique’s middle class and the preoccupation with racial identity that negritude promotes, Fanon left the colony in 1943, at the age of 18, to fight with the Free French forces in the waning days of World War II.

After the war, he stayed in France to study psychiatry and medicine at university in Lyons. Here, he encountered bafflingly simplistic anti-black racism—so different from the complex, class-permeated distinctions of shades of lightness and darkness one finds in the Caribbean—which would so enrage him that he was inspired to write “An Essay for the Disalienation of Blacks,” the piece of writing that would eventually become Peau Noire, Masques Blancs (1952). It was here too that he began to explore the Marxist and existentialist ideas that would inform the radical departure from the assimilation-negritude dichotomy that Peau Noire’s anti-racist humanism inaugurates.

Although he briefly returned to the Caribbean after he finished his studies, he no longer felt at home there and in 1953, after a stint in Paris, he accepted a position as chef de service (chief of staff) for the psychiatric ward of the Blida-Joinville hospital in Algeria. The following year, 1954, marked the eruption of the Algerian war of independence against France, an uprising directed by the Front de Libération Nationale (FLN) and brutally repressed by French armed forces. Working in a French hospital, Fanon was increasingly responsible for treating both the psychological distress of the soldiers and officers of the French army who carried out torture in order to suppress anti-colonial resistance and the trauma suffered by the Algerian torture victims. Already alienated by the homogenizing effects of French imperialism, by 1956 Fanon realized he could not continue to aid French efforts to put down a decolonization movement that commanded his political loyalties, and he resigned his position at the hospital.

Once he was no longer officially working for the French government in Algeria, Fanon was free to devote himself to the cause of Algerian independence. During this period, he was based primarily in Tunisia where he trained nurses for the FLN, edited its newspaper el Moujahid, and contributed articles about the movement to sympathetic publications, including Presence Africaine and Jean-Paul Sartre’s journal Les Temps Modernes. Some of Fanon’s writings from this period were published posthumously in 1964 as Pour la Révolution Africaine (Toward the African Revolution). In 1959 Fanon published a series of essays, L’An Cinq, de la Révolution Algérienne, (The Year of the Algerian Revolution) which detail how the oppressed natives of Algeria organized themselves into a revolutionary fighting force. That same year, he took up a diplomatic post in the provisional Algerian government, ambassador to Ghana, and used the influence of this position to help open up supply routes for the Algerian army. It was in Ghana that Fanon was diagnosed with the leukemia that would be his cause of death. Despite his rapidly failing health, Fanon spent ten months of his last year of life writing the book for which he would be most remembered, Les Damnés de la Terre, an indictment of the violence and savagery of colonialism which he ends with a passionate call for a new history of humanity to be initiated by a decolonized Third World. In October 1961, Fanon was brought to the United States by a C.I.A. agent so that he could receive treatment at a National Institutes of Health facility in Bethesda, Maryland. He died two months later, on December 6, 1961, reportedly still preoccupied with the cause of liberty and justice for the peoples of the Third World. At the request of the FLN, his body was returned to Tunisia, where it was subsequently transported across the border and buried in the soil of the Algerian nation for which he fought so single-mindedly during the last five years of his life.

2. Africana Phenomenology

Fanon’s contribution to phenomenology, glossed as a critical race discourse (an analysis of the pre-conscious forces shaping the self that organizes itself around race as a founding category), most particularly his exploration of the existential challenges faced by black human beings in a social world that is constituted for white human beings, receives its most explicit treatment in Peau Noire, Masques Blancs. The central metaphor of this book, that black people must wear “white masks” in order to get by in a white world, is reminiscent of W.E.B. Du Bois’ argument that African Americans develop a double consciousness living under a white power structure: one that flatters that structure (or some such) and one experienced when among other African Americans. Fanon’s treatment of the ways black people respond to a social context that racializes them at the expense of our shared humanity ranges across a broader range of cultures than Du Bois, however; Fanon examines how race shapes (deforms) the lives of both men and women in the French Caribbean, in France, and in colonial conflicts in Africa. Africana sociologist Paget Henry characterizes Fanon’s relation to Du Bois in the realm of phenomenology as one of extension and of clarification, since he offers a more detailed investigation of how the self encounters the trauma of being categorized by others as inferior due to an imposed racial identity and how that self can recuperate a sense of identity and a cultural affiliation that is independent of the racist project of an imperializing dominant culture.

Fanon dissects in all of his major works the racist and colonizing project of white European culture, that is, the totalizing, hierarchical worldview that needs to set up the black human being as “negro” so it has an “other” against which to define itself. While Peau Noire offers a sustained discussion of the psychological dimensions of this “negrification” of human beings and possibilities of resistance to it, the political dimensions are explored in L’An Cinq, de la Révolution Algérienne and Les Damnés de la Terre. Fanon’s diagnosis of the psychological dimensions of negrification’s phenomenological violence documents its traumatizing effects: first, negrification promotes negative attitudes toward other blacks and Africa; second, it normalizes attitudes of desire and debasement toward Europe, white people, and white culture in general; and finally, it presents itself as such an all-encompassing way of being in the world that no other alternative appears to be possible. The difficulty of overcoming the sense of alienation that negrification sets up as necessary for the black human being lies in learning to see oneself not just as envisioned and valued (that is, devalued) by the white dominant culture but simultaneously through a perspective constructed both in opposition to and independently from the racist/racialized mainstream, a parallel perspective in which a black man or woman’s value judgments—of oneself and of others of one’s race—do not have to be filtered through white norms and values. It is only through development of this latter perspective that the black man or woman can shake off the psychological colonization that racist phenomenology imposes, Fanon argues.

One of the most pervasive agents of phenomenological conditioning is language. In Peau Noire, Fanon analyzes language as that which carries and reveals racism in culture, using as an example the symbolism of whiteness and blackness in the French language—a point that translates equally well into English linguistic habits. One cannot learn and speak this language, Fanon asserts, without subconsciously accepting the cultural meanings embedded in equations of purity with whiteness and malevolence with blackness: to be white is to be good, and to be black is to be bad. While Peau Noire focuses on the colonizing aspects of the French language, L’An Cinq, on the other hand, offers an interesting account of how language might enable decolonization efforts. Fanon describes a decision made by the revolutionary forces in Algeria in 1956 to give up their previous boycott of French and instead start using it as the lingua franca that could unite diverse communities of resistance, including those who did not speak Arabic. The subversive effects of adopting French extended beyond the convenience of a common language; it also cast doubt on the simplistic assumption the French colonizers had been making, namely, that all French speakers in Algeria were loyal to the colonial government. After strategically adopting the colonizer’s language, one entered a shop or a government office no longer necessarily announcing one’s politics in one’s choice of language.

Fanon’s critical race phenomenology is not without its critics, many of whom read Peau Noire’s back-to-back accounts of the black woman’s desire for a white lover and the black man’s desire for a white lover as misogynistic. According to these critiques, typically offered from a feminist point of view, the autobiography of Mayotte Capécia, a Martinican woman who seeks the love of a white man, any white man it seems, is treated by Fanon (who describes it as “cut-rate” and “ridiculous”) with far less respect than the novel by René Maran, which describes the story of Jean Veneuse, a black man who reluctantly falls in love with a white Frenchwoman and hesitates to marry her until he is urged to do so by her brother. Although Fanon is unequivocal in his statement that both of these discussions serve as examples of “alienated psyches,” white feminists who make this charge of misogyny point to his less sympathetic account of Capécia as evidence that he holds black women complicit in the devaluing of blackness. Where it is found at all in the work of black feminist writers, this allegation tends to be more tentative, and tends to be contextualized within a pluralist inventory of phenomenological approaches. Just as Fanon selects race as the founding category of phenomenology, a feminist phenomenology would focus on gender as a founding category. In this pluralist framework, Fanon’s attention to race at the expense of gender is arguably more explicable as a methodological choice than a deep-seated contempt for women.

3. Decolonization Theory

The political dimensions of negrification that call for decolonization receive fuller treatment in L’An Cinq, de la Révolution Algérienne and Les Damnés de la Terre. But Fanon does not simply diagnose the political symptoms of the worldview within which black men and women are dehumanized. He situates his diagnosis within an unambiguous ethical commitment to the equal right of every human being to have his or her human dignity recognized by others. This assertion, that all of us are entitled to moral consideration and that no one is dispensable, is the principled core of his decolonization theory, which continues to inspire scholars and activists dedicated to human rights and social justice.

As the French title suggests, L’An Cinq (published in English as A Dying Colonialism) is Fanon’s first-hand account of how the Algerian people mobilized themselves into a revolutionary fighting force and repelled the French colonial government. The lessons that other aspiring revolutionary movements can learn from Fanon’s presentation of the FLN’s strategies and tactics are embedded in their particular Algerian context, but nonetheless evidently adaptable. In addition to describing the FLN’s strategic adoption of French as the language of communication with its sympathetic civilian population, Fanon also traces the interplay of ideological and pragmatic choices they made about communications technology. Once the French started suppressing newspapers, the FLN had to rethink their standing boycott of radios, which they had previously denounced as the colonizer’s technology. This led to the creation of a nationalist radio station, the Voice of Fighting Algeria, that now challenged colonial propaganda with what Fanon described as “the first words of the nation.” Another of the fundamental challenges they issued to the colonial world of division and hierarchy was the radically inclusive statement the provisional government made that all people living in Algeria would be considered citizens of the new nation. This was a bold contestation of European imperialism on the model of Haiti’s first constitution (1805), which attempted to break down hierarchies of social privilege based on skin color by declaring that all Haitian citizens would be considered black. Both the Algerian and Haitian declarations are powerful decolonizing moves because they undermine the very Manichean structure that Fanon identifies as the foundation of the colonial world.

While L’An Cinq offers the kinds of insights one might hope for from a historical document, Les Damnés de la Terre is a more abstract analysis of colonialism and revolution. It has been described as a handbook for black revolution. The book ranges over the necessary role Fanon thinks violence must play in decolonization struggles, the false paths decolonizing nations take when they entrust their eventual freedom to negotiations between a native elite class and the formers colonizers instead of mobilizing the masses as a popular fighting force, the need to recreate a national culture through a revolutionary arts and literature movement, and an inventory of the psychiatric disorders that colonial repression unleashes. Part of its shocking quality, from a philosophical perspective, is alluded to in the preface that Jean-Paul Sartre wrote for the book: it speaks the language of philosophy and deploys the kind of Marxist and Hegelian arguments one might expect in a philosophy of liberation, but it does not speak to the West. It is Fanon conversing with, advising, his fellow Third-World revolutionaries.

The controversy that swirls around Les Damnés is very different from the one Peau Noire attracts. Where feminist critiques of Peau Noire require a deep reading and an analysis of the kinds of questions Fanon failed to ask, those who find fault with Les Damnés for what they see as its endorsement of violent insurgency are often reading Fanon’s words too simplistically. His argument is not that decolonizing natives are justified in using violent means to effect their ends; the point he is making in his opening chapter, “Concerning Violence,” is that violence is a fundamental element of colonization, introduced by the colonizers and visited upon the colonized as part of the colonial oppression. The choice concerning violence that the colonized native must make, in Fanon’s view, is between continuing to accept it—absorbing the abuse or displacing it upon other members of the oppressed native community—or taking this foreign violence and throwing it back in the face of those who initiated it. Fanon’s consistent existentialist commitment to choosing one’s character through one’s actions means that decolonization can only happen when the native takes up his or her responsible subjecthood and refuses to occupy the position of violence-absorbing passive victim.

4. Influences on Fanon’s Thought

The first significant influence on Fanon was the philosophy of negritude to which he was introduced by Aimé Césaire. Although this philosophy of black pride was a potent counterbalance to the assimilation tendencies into which Fanon had been socialized, it was ultimately an inadequate response to an imperializing culture that presents itself as a universal worldview. Far more fruitful, in Fanon’s view, were his studies in France of Hegel, Marx, and Husserl. From these sources he developed the view that dialectic could be the process through which the othered/alienated self can respond to racist trauma in a healthy way, a sensitivity to the social and economic forces that shape human beings, and an appreciation for the pre-conscious construction of self that phenomenology can reveal. He also found Sartre’s existentialism a helpful resource for theorizing the process of self construction by which each of us chooses to become the persons we are. This relation with Sartre appears to have been particularly mutually beneficial; Sartre’s existentialism permeates Peau Noire and in turn, Sartre’s heartfelt and radical commitment to decolonization suggests that Fanon had quite an influence on him.

5. Movements and Thinkers Influenced by Fanon

The pan-Africanism that Fanon understood himself to be contributing to in his work on behalf of Third World peoples never really materialized as a political movement. It must be remembered that in Fanon’s day, the term “Third World” did not have the meaning it has today. Where today it designates a collection of desperately poor countries that are the objects of the developed world’s charity, in the 1950s and 1960s, the term indicated the hope of an emerging alternative to political alliance with either the First World (the United States and Europe) or the Second World (the Soviet bloc). The attempt to generate political solidarity and meaningful political power among the newly independent nations of Africa instead foundered as these former colonies fell victim to precisely the sort of false decolonization and client-statism that Fanon had warned against. Today, as a political program, that ideal of small-state solidarity survives only in the leftist critiques of neoliberalism offered by activists like Noam Chomsky and Naomi Klein.

Instead, the discourse of solidarity and political reconstruction has retreated into the academy, where it is theorized as “postcolonialism.” Here we find the critical theorizing of scholars like Edward Said and Gayatri Spivak, both of whom construct analyses of the colonial Self and the colonized Other that, implicitly at least, depend on the Manichean division that Fanon presents in Les Damnés.

Thinkers around the globe have been profoundly influenced by Fanon’s work on anti-black racism and decolonization theory. Brazilian theorist of critical pedagogy Paulo Freire engages Fanon in dialogue in Pedagogy of the Oppressed, notably in his discussion of the mis-steps that oppressed people may make on their path to liberation. Freire’s emphasis on the need to go beyond a mere turning of the tables, a seizure of the privileges and social positions of the oppressors, echoes Fanon’s concern in Les Damnés and in essays such as “Racism and Culture” (in Pour la Révolution Africaine) that failure to appreciate the deeply Manichean structure of the settler-native division could lead to a false decolonization in which a native elite simply replace the settler elite as the oppressive rulers of the still exploited masses. This shared concern is the motivation for Freire’s insistence on perspectival transformation and on populist inclusion as necessary conditions for social liberation.

Kenyan author and decolonization activist Ngũgĩ wa Thiong’o also draws on ideas Fanon presents in Les Damnés. Inspired mainly by Fanon’s meditations on the need to decolonize national consciousness, Ngũgĩ has written of the need to get beyond the “colonization of the mind” that occurs in using the language of imposed powers. Like Fanon, he recognizes that language has a dual character. It colonizes in the sense that power congeals in the history of how language is used (that is, its role in carrying culture). But it can also be adapted to our real-life communication and our “image-forming” projects, which means it also always carries the potential to be the means by which we liberate ourselves. Ngũgĩ’s last book in English, Decolonizing the Mind, was his official renunciation of the colonizer’s language in favor of his native tongue, Gĩkũyũ, and its account of the politics of language in African literature can fruitfully be read as an illustration of the abstract claims Fanon makes about art and culture in Les Damnés and Pour la Révolution Africaine.

Maori scholar Linda Tuhiwai Smith takes up Fanon’s call for artists and intellectuals of decolonizing societies to create new literatures and new cultures for their liberated nations. Applying Fanon’s call to her own context, Tuhiwai Smith notes that Maori writers in New Zealand have begun to produce literature that reflects and supports a resurgent indigenous sovereignty movement, but she notes that there is little attention to achieving that same intellectual autonomy in the social sciences. Inspired by Fanon’s call to voice, she has written Decolonizing Methodologies, a book that interrogates the way “research” has been used by European colonial powers to subjugate indigenous peoples and also lays out methodological principles for indigenous research agendas that will not reproduce the same dehumanizing results that colonial knowledge production has been responsible for

In the United States, Fanon’s influence continues to grow. Feminist theorist bell hooks, one of those who notes the absence of attention to gender in Fanon’s work, nonetheless acknowledges the power of his vision of the resistant decolonized subject and the possibility of love that this vision nurtures. Existential phenomenologist Lewis R. Gordon works to articulate the new humanism that Fanon identified as the goal of a decolonized anti-racist philosophy. Gordon is one of the Africana–and Caribbean–focused scholars in American academia who has been involved in founding today’s most prominent Africana-Caribbean research network, the Caribbean Philosophical Association, which awards an annual book prize in Frantz Fanon’s name. The Frantz Fanon Prize recognizes excellence in scholarship that advances Caribbean philosophy and Africana-humanist thought in the Fanonian tradition.

In Paris, the heart of the former empire that Fanon opposed so vigorously in his short life, his philosophy of humanist liberation and his commitment to the moral relevance of all people everywhere have been taken up by his daughter Mireille Fanon. She heads the Fondation Frantz Fanon and follows in her father’s footsteps with her work on questions of international law and human rights, supporting the rights of migrants, and championing struggles against the impunity of the powerful and all forms of racism.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Fanon, Frantz. L’An Cinq, de la Révolution Algérienne. Paris: François Maspero, 1959. [Published in English as A Dying Colonialism, trans. Haakon Chevalier (New York: Grove Press, 1965).]
Fanon, Frantz. Les Damnés de la Terre. Paris: François Maspero, 1961. [Published in English as The Wretched of the Earth, trans. Constance Farrington (New York: Grove Press, 1965).]
Fanon, Frantz. Peau Noire, Masques Blancs. Paris: Editions du Seuil, 1952. [Published in English as Black Skin, White Masks, trans. Charles Lam Markmann (New York: Grove Press, 1967).]
Fanon, Frantz. Pour la Révolution Africaine. Paris: François Maspero, 1964. [Published in English as Toward the African Revolution, trans. Haakon Chevalier (New York: Grove Press, 1967).]

b. Secondary Sources

Cherki, Alice. Frantz Fanon: A Portrait. Trans. Nadia Benabid. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 2006.
- A biography of Fanon by one of his co-workers at the Blida-Joinville hospital in Algeria and fellow activists for Algerian liberation.
Gibson, Nigel C. Fanon: The Postcolonial Imagination. Cambridge, UK: Polity Press, 2003.
- An introduction to Fanon’s ideas with emphasis on the role that dialectic played in his development of a philosophy of liberation.
Gibson, Nigel C. (ed.). Rethinking Fanon: The Continuing Dialogue. Amherst, NY: Humanity Books, 1999.
- A collection of some of the enduring essays on Fanon, with attention to his continuing relevance.
Gordon, Lewis R. Fanon and the Crisis of European Man: An Essay on Philosophy and the Human Sciences. New York: Routledge, 1995.
- An argument in the Fanonian vein that bad faith in European practice of the human sciences has impeded the inclusive humanism Fanon called for.
Gordon, Lewis R., T. Denean Sharpley-Whiting, and Renée T. White (eds.). Fanon: A Critical Reader. Malden, MA: Blackwell, 1996.
- Essays on Africana philosophy, neocolonial and postcolonial studies, human sciences, and other academic discourses that place Fanon’s work in its appropriate and illuminating contexts.
Hoppe, Elizabeth A. and Tracey Nicholls (eds.). Fanon and the Decolonization of Philosophy. Lanham, MD: Lexington Books, 2010.
- Essays by contemporary Fanon scholars exploring the enduring relevance to philosophy of Fanon’s thought.
Sekyi-Out, Ato. Fanon’s Dialectic of Experience. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1996.
- A hermeneutic reading of all of Fanon’s texts as a single dialectical narrative.
Zahar, Renate. Frantz Fanon: Colonialism and Alienation. New York: Monthly Review Press, 1974.
- An analysis of Fanon’s writings through the concept of alienation.

Author Information

Tracey Nicholls
Email: tracey.j.nicholls@gmail.com
Lewis University
U. S. A.

Existentialism

Existentialism is a catch-all term for those philosophers who consider the nature of the human condition as a key philosophical problem and who share the view that this problem is best addressed through ontology. This very broad definition will be clarified by discussing seven key themes that existentialist thinkers address. Those philosophers considered existentialists are mostly from the continent of Europe, and date from the 19^th and 20^th centuries. Outside philosophy, the existentialist movement is probably the most well-known philosophical movement, and at least two of its members are among the most famous philosophical personalities and widely read philosophical authors. It has certainly had considerable influence outside philosophy, for example on psychological theory and on the arts. Within philosophy, though, it is safe to say that this loose movement considered as a whole has not had a great impact, although individuals or ideas counted within it remain important. Moreover, most of the philosophers conventionally grouped under this heading either never used, or actively disavowed, the term ‘existentialist’. Even Sartre himself once said: “Existentialism? I don’t know what that is.” So, there is a case to be made that the term – insofar as it leads us to ignore what is distinctive about philosophical positions and to conflate together significantly different ideas – does more harm than good.

In this article, however, it is assumed that something sensible can be said about existentialism as a loosely defined movement. The article has three sections. First, we outline a set of themes that define, albeit very broadly, existentialist concerns. This is done with reference to the historical context of existentialism, which will help us to understand why certain philosophical problems and methods were considered so important. Second, we discuss individually six philosophers who are arguably its central figures, stressing in these discussions the ways in which these philosophers approached existentialist themes in distinctive ways. These figures, and many of the others we mention, have full length articles of their own within the Encyclopedia. Finally, we look very briefly at the influence of existentialism, especially outside philosophy.

Key Themes of Existentialism
Key Existentialist Philosophers
The Influence of Existentialism
1. The Arts and Psychology
2. Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Key Themes of Existentialism

Although a highly diverse tradition of thought, seven themes can be identified that provide some sense of overall unity. Here, these themes will be briefly introduced; they can then provide us with an intellectual framework within which to discuss exemplary figures within the history of existentialism.

a. Philosophy as a Way of Life

Philosophy should not be thought of primarily either as an attempt to investigate and understand the self or the world, or as a special occupation that concerns only a few. Rather, philosophy must be thought of as fully integrated within life. To be sure, there may need to be professional philosophers, who develop an elaborate set of methods and concepts (Sartre makes this point frequently) but life can be lived philosophically without a technical knowledge of philosophy. Existentialist thinkers tended to identify two historical antecedents for this notion. First, the ancient Greeks, and particularly the figure of Socrates but also the Stoics and Epicureans. Socrates was not only non-professional, but in his pursuit of the good life he tended to eschew the formation of a ‘system’ or ‘theory’, and his teachings took place often in public spaces. In this, the existentialists were hardly unusual. In the 19^th and 20^th centuries, the rapid expansion of industrialisation and advance in technology were often seen in terms of an alienation of the human from nature or from a properly natural way of living (for example, thinkers of German and English romanticism).

The second influence on thinking of philosophy as a way of life was German Idealism after Kant. Partly as a response to the 18^th century Enlightenment, and under the influence of the Neoplatonists, Schelling and Hegel both thought of philosophy as an activity that is an integral part of the history of human beings, rather than outside of life and the world, looking on. Later in the 19^th century, Marx famously criticised previous philosophy by saying that the point of philosophy is not to know things – even to know things about activity – but to change them. The concept of philosophy as a way of life manifests itself in existentialist thought in a number of ways. Let us give several examples, to which we will return in the sections that follow. First, the existentialists often undertook a critique of modern life in terms of the specialisation of both manual and intellectual labour. Specialisation included philosophy. One consequence of this is that many existentialist thinkers experimented with different styles or genres of writing in order to escape the effects of this specialisation. Second, a notion that we can call ‘immanence’: philosophy studies life from the inside. For Kierkegaard, for example, the fundamental truths of my existence are not representations – not, that is, ideas, propositions or symbols the meaning of which can be separated from their origin. Rather, the truths of existence are immediately lived, felt and acted. Likewise, for Nietzsche and Heidegger, it is essential to recognise that the philosopher investigating human existence is, him or herself, an existing human. Third, the nature of life itself is a perennial existentialist concern and, more famously (in Heidegger and in Camus), also the significance of death.

b. Anxiety and Authenticity

A key idea here is that human existence is in some way ‘on its own’; anxiety (or anguish) is the recognition of this fact. Anxiety here has two important implications. First, most generally, many existentialists tended to stress the significance of emotions or feelings, in so far as they were presumed to have a less culturally or intellectually mediated relation to one’s individual and separate existence. This idea is found in Kierkegaard, as we mentioned above, and in Heidegger’s discussion of ‘mood’; it is also one reason why existentialism had an influence on psychology. Second, anxiety also stands for a form of existence that is recognition of being on its own. What is meant by ‘being on its own’ varies among philosophers. For example, it might mean the irrelevance (or even negative influence) of rational thought, moral values, or empirical evidence, when it comes to making fundamental decisions concerning one’s existence. As we shall see, Kierkegaard sees Hegel’s account of religion in terms of the history of absolute spirit as an exemplary confusion of faith and reason. Alternatively, it might be a more specifically theological claim: the existence of a transcendent deity is not relevant to (or is positively detrimental to) such decisions (a view broadly shared by Nietzsche and Sartre). Finally, being on its own might signify the uniqueness of human existence, and thus the fact that it cannot understand itself in terms of other kinds of existence (Heidegger and Sartre).

Related to anxiety is the concept of authenticity, which is let us say the existentialist spin on the Greek notion of ‘the good life’. As we shall see, the authentic being would be able to recognise and affirm the nature of existence (we shall shortly specify some of the aspects of this, such as absurdity and freedom). Not, though, recognise the nature of existence as an intellectual fact, disengaged from life; but rather, the authentic being lives in accordance with this nature. The notion of authenticity is sometimes seen as connected to individualism. This is only reinforced by the contrast with a theme we will discuss below, that of the ‘crowd’. Certainly, if authenticity involves ‘being on one’s own’, then there would seem to be some kind of value in celebrating and sustaining one’s difference and independence from others. However, many existentialists see individualism as a historical and cultural trend (for example Nietzsche), or dubious political value (Camus), rather than a necessary component of authentic existence. Individualism tends to obscure the particular types of collectivity that various existentialists deem important.

For many existentialists, the conditions of the modern world make authenticity especially difficult. For example, many existentialists would join other philosophers (such as the Frankfurt School) in condemning an instrumentalist conception of reason and value. The utilitarianism of Mill measured moral value and justice also in terms of the consequences of actions. Later liberalism would seek to absorb nearly all functions of political and social life under the heading of economic performance. Evaluating solely in terms of the measurable outcomes of production was seen as reinforcing the secularisation of the institutions of political, social or economic life; and reinforcing also the abandonment of any broader sense of the spiritual dimension (such an idea is found acutely in Emerson, and is akin to the concerns of Kierkegaard). Existentialists such as Martin Heidegger, Hanna Arendt or Gabriel Marcel viewed these social movements in terms of a narrowing of the possibilities of human thought to the instrumental or technological. This narrowing involved thinking of the world in terms of resources, and thinking of all human action as a making, or indeed as a machine-like ‘function’.

c. Freedom

The next key theme is freedom. Freedom can usefully be linked to the concept of anguish, because my freedom is in part defined by the isolation of my decisions from any determination by a deity, or by previously existent values or knowledge. Many existentialists identified the 19^th and 20^th centuries as experiencing a crisis of values. This might be traced back to familiar reasons such as an increasingly secular society, or the rise of scientific or philosophical movements that questioned traditional accounts of value (for example Marxism or Darwinism), or the shattering experience of two world wars and the phenomenon of mass genocide. It is important to note, however, that for existentialism these historical conditions do not create the problem of anguish in the face of freedom, but merely cast it into higher relief. Likewise, freedom entails something like responsibility, for myself and for my actions. Given that my situation is one of being on its own – recognised in anxiety – then both my freedom and my responsibility are absolute. The isolation that we discussed above means that there is nothing else that acts through me, or that shoulders my responsibility. Likewise, unless human existence is to be understood as arbitrarily changing moment to moment, this freedom and responsibility must stretch across time. Thus, when I exist as an authentically free being, I assume responsibility for my whole life, for a ‘project’ or a ‘commitment’. We should note here that many of the existentialists take on a broadly Kantian notion of freedom: freedom as autonomy. This means that freedom, rather than being randomness or arbitrariness, consists in the binding of oneself to a law, but a law that is given by the self in recognition of its responsibilities. This borrowing from Kant, however, is heavily qualified by the next theme.

d. Situatedness

The next common theme we shall call ‘situatedness’. Although my freedom is absolute, it always takes place in a particular context. My body and its characteristics, my circumstances in a historical world, and my past, all weigh upon freedom. This is what makes freedom meaningful. Suppose I tried to exist as free, while pretending to be in abstraction from the situation. In that case I will have no idea what possibilities are open to me and what choices need to be made, here and now. In such a case, my freedom will be naïve or illusory. This concrete notion of freedom has its philosophical genesis in Hegel, and is generally contrasted to the pure rational freedom described by Kant. Situatedness is related to a notion we discussed above under the heading of philosophy as a way of life: the necessity of viewing or understanding life and existence from the ‘inside’. For example, many 19^th century intellectuals were interested in ancient Greece, Rome, the Medieval period, or the orient, as alternative models of a less spoiled, more integrated form of life. Nietzsche, to be sure, shared these interests, but he did so not uncritically: because the human condition is characterised by being historically situated, it cannot simply turn back the clock or decide all at once to be other than it is (Sartre especially shares this view). Heidegger expresses a related point in this way: human existence cannot be abstracted from its world because being-in-the-world is part of the ontological structure of that existence. Many existentialists take my concretely individual body, and the specific type of life that my body lives, as a primary fact about me (for example, Nietzsche, Scheler or Merleau-Ponty). I must also be situated socially: each of my acts says something about how I view others but, reciprocally, each of their acts is a view about what I am. My freedom is always situated with respect to the judgements of others. This particular notion comes from Hegel’s analysis of ‘recognition’, and is found especially in Sartre, de Beauvoir and Jaspers. Situatedness in general also has an important philosophical antecedent in Marx: economic and political conditions are not contingent features with respect to universal human nature, but condition that nature from the ground up.

e. Existence

Although, of course, existentialism takes its name from the philosophical theme of ‘existence’, this does not entail that there is homogeneity in the manner existence is to be understood. One point on which there is agreement, though, is that the existence with which we should be concerned here is not just any existent thing, but human existence. There is thus an important difference between distinctively human existence and anything else, and human existence is not to be understood on the model of things, that is, as objects of knowledge. One might think that this is an old idea, rooted in Plato’s distinction between matter and soul, or Descartes’ between extended and thinking things. But these distinctions appear to be just differences between two types of things. Descartes in particular, however, is often criticised by the existentialists for subsuming both under the heading ‘substance’, and thus treating what is distinctive in human existence as indeed a thing or object, albeit one with different properties. (Whether the existentialist characterisation of Plato or Descartes is accurate is a different question.) The existentialists thus countered the Platonic or Cartesian conception with a model that resembles more the Aristotelian as developed in the Nichomachean Ethics. The latter idea arrives in existentialist thought filtered through Leibniz and Spinoza and the notion of a striving for existence. Equally important is the elevation of the practical above the theoretical in German Idealists. Particularly in Kant, who stressed the primacy of the ‘practical’, and then in Fichte and early Schelling, we find the notion that human existence is action. Accordingly, in Nietzsche and Sartre we find the notion that the human being is all and only what that being does. My existence consists of forever bringing myself into being – and, correlatively, fleeing from the dead, inert thing that is the totality of my past actions. Although my acts are free, I am not free not to act; thus existence is characterised also by ‘exigency’ (Marcel). For many existentialists, authentic existence involves a certain tension be recognised and lived through, but not resolved: this tension might be between the animal and the rational (important in Nietzsche) or between facticity and transcendence (Sartre and de Beauvoir).

In the 19^th and 20^th centuries, the human sciences (such as psychology, sociology or economics) were coming to be recognised as powerful and legitimate sciences. To some extend at least their assumptions and methods seemed to be borrowed from the natural sciences. While philosophers such as Dilthey and later Gadamer were concerned to show that the human sciences had to have a distinctive method, the existentialists were inclined to go further. The free, situated human being is not an object of knowledge in the sense the human always exists as the possibility of transcending any knowledge of it. There is a clear relation between such an idea and the notion of the ‘transcendence of the other’ found in the ethical phenomenology of Emmanuel Levinas.

f. Irrationality/Absurdity

Among the most famous ideas associated with existentialism is that of ‘absurdity’. Human existence might be described as ‘absurd’ in one of the following senses. First, many existentialists argued that nature as a whole has no design, no reason for existing. Although the natural world can apparently be understood by physical science or metaphysics, this might be better thought of as ‘description’ than either understanding or explanation. Thus, the achievements of the natural sciences also empty nature of value and meaning. Unlike a created cosmos, for example, we cannot expect the scientifically described cosmos to answer our questions concerning value or meaning. Moreover, such description comes at the cost of a profound falsification of nature: namely, the positing of ideal entities such as ‘laws of nature’, or the conflation of all reality under a single model of being. Human beings can and should become profoundly aware of this lack of reason and the impossibility of an immanent understanding of it. Camus, for example, argues that the basic scene of human existence is its confrontation with this mute irrationality. A second meaning of the absurd is this: my freedom will not only be undetermined by knowledge or reason, but from the point of view of the latter my freedom will even appear absurd. Absurdity is thus closely related to the theme of ‘being on its own’, which we discussed above under the heading of anxiety. Even if I choose to follow a law that I have given myself, my choice of law will appear absurd, and likewise will my continuously reaffirmed choice to follow it. Third, human existence as action is doomed to always destroy itself. A free action, once done, is no longer free; it has become an aspect of the world, a thing. The absurdity of human existence then seems to lie in the fact that in becoming myself (a free existence) I must be what I am not (a thing). If I do not face up to this absurdity, and choose to be or pretend to be thing-like, I exist inauthentically (the terms in this formulation are Sartre’s).

g. The Crowd

Existentialism generally also carries a social or political dimension. Insofar as he or she is authentic, the freedom of the human being will show a certain ‘resolution’ or ‘commitment’, and this will involve also the being – and particularly the authentic being – of others. For example, Nietzsche thus speaks of his (or Zarathustra’s) work in aiding the transformation of the human, and there is also in Nietzsche a striking analysis of the concept of friendship; for Heidegger, there must be an authentic mode of being-with others, although he does not develop this idea at length; the social and political aspect of authentic commitment is much more clear in Sartre, de Beauvoir and Camus.

That is the positive side of the social or political dimension. However, leading up to this positive side, there is a description of the typical forms that inauthentic social or political existence takes. Many existentialists employ terms such as ‘crowd’, ‘horde’ (Scheler) or the ‘masses’ (José Ortega y Gasset). Nietzsche’s deliberately provocative expression, ‘the herd’, portrays the bulk of humanity not only as animal, but as docile and domesticated animals. Notice that these are all collective terms: inauthenticity manifests itself as de-individuated or faceless. Instead of being formed authentically in freedom and anxiety, values are just accepted from others because ‘that is what everybody does’. These terms often carry a definite historical resonance, embodying a critique of specifically modern modes of human existence. All of the following might be seen as either causes or symptoms of a world that is ‘fallen’ or ‘broken’ (Marcel): the technology of mass communication (Nietzsche is particularly scathing about newspapers and journalists; in Two Ages, Kierkegaard says something very similar), empty religious observances, the specialisation of labour and social roles, urbanisation and industrialisation. The theme of the crowd poses a question also to the positive social or political dimension of existentialism: how could a collective form of existence ever be anything other than inauthentic? The 19^th and 20^th century presented a number of mass political ideologies which might be seen as posing a particularly challenging environment for authentic and free existence. For example, nationalism came in for criticism particularly by Nietzsche. Socialism and communism: after WWII, Sartre was certainly a communist, but even then unafraid to criticise both the French communist party and the Soviet Union for rigid or inadequately revolutionary thinking. Democracy: Aristotle in book 5 of his Politics distinguishes between democracy and ochlocracy, which latter essentially means rule by those incapable of ruling even themselves. Many existentialists would identify the latter with the American and especially French concept of ‘democracy’. Nietzsche and Ortega y Gasset both espoused a broadly aristocratic criterion for social and political leadership.

2. Key Existentialist Philosophers

a. Søren Kierkegaard (1813-1855) as an Existentialist Philosopher

Kierkegaard was many things: philosopher, religious writer, satirist, psychologist, journalist, literary critic and generally considered the ‘father’ of existentialism. Being born (in Copenhagen) to a wealthy family enabled him to devote his life to the pursuits of his intellectual interests as well as to distancing himself from the ‘everyday man’ of his times.

Kierkegaard’s most important works are pseudonymous, written under fictional names, often very obviously fictional. The issue of pseudonymity has been variously interpreted as a literary device, a personal quirk or as an illustration of the constant tension between the philosophical truth and existential or personal truth. We have already seen that for the existentialists it is of equal importance what one says and the way in which something is said. This forms part of the attempt to return to a more authentic way of philosophising, firstly exemplified by the Greeks. In a work like Either/Or (primarily a treatise against the Hegelians) theoretical reflections are followed by reflections on how to seduce girls. The point is to stress the distance between the anonymously and logically produced truths of the logicians and the personal truths of existing individuals. Every pseudonymous author is a symbol for an existing individual and at times his very name is the key to the mysteries of his existence (like in the case of Johanes de Silentio, fictional author of Fear and Trembling, where the mystery of Abraham’s actions cannot be told, being a product of and belonging to silence).

Kierkegaard has been associated with a notion of truth as subjective (or personal); but what does this mean? The issue is linked with his notorious confrontation with the Danish Church and the academic environment of his days. Kierkegaard’s work takes place against the background of an academia dominated by Hegelian dialectics and a society which reduces the communication with the divine to the everyday observance of the ritualistic side of an institutionalized Christianity. Hegel is for Kierkegaard his arch-enemy not only because of what he writes but also what he represents. Hegel is guilty for Kierkegaard because he reduced the living truth of Christianity (the fact that God suffered and died on the Cross) to just another moment, which necessarily will be overcome, in the dialectical development of the Spirit. While Hegel treats “God” as a Begriff (a concept), for Kierkegaard the truth of Christianity signifies the very paradoxicality of faith: that is, that it is possible for the individual to go beyond the ‘ethical’ and nevertheless or rather because of this very act of disobedience to be loved by ‘God’. Famously, for Hegel ‘all that is real is rational’ – where rationality means the historically articulated, dialectical progression of Spirit – whereas for Kierkegaard the suspension of rationality is the very secret of Christianity. Against the cold logic of the Hegelian system Kierkegaard seeks “a truth which is truth for me” (Kierkegaard 1996:32). Christianity in particular represents the attempt to offer one’s life to the service of the divine. This cannot be argued, it can only be lived. While a theologian will try to argue for the validity of his positions by arguing and counter-arguing, a true Christian will try to live his life the way Jesus lived it. This evidently marks the continuation of the Hellenic idea of philosophy as a way of life, exemplified in the person of Socrates who did not write treatises, but who died for his ideas. Before the logical concepts of the theologians (in the words of Martin Heidegger who was hugely influenced by Kierkegaard) “man can neither fall to his knees in awe nor can he play music and dance before this god” (Heidegger 2002:42). The idea of ‘subjective truth’ will have serious consequences to the philosophical understanding of man. Traditionally defined as animale rationale (the rational animal) by Aristotle and for a long time worshiped as such by generations of philosophical minds, Kierkegaard comes now to redefine the human as the ‘passionate animal’. What counts in man is the intensity of his emotions and his willingness to believe (contra the once all powerful reason) in that which cannot be understood. The opening up by Kierkegaard of this terra incognita of man’s inner life will come to play a major role for later existentialists (most importantly for Nietzsche) and will bring to light the failings and the weaknesses of an over-optimistic (because modelled after the Natural sciences) model of philosophy which was taught to talk a lot concerning the ‘truth’ of the human, when all it understood about the human was a mutilated version.

In the Garden of Eden, Adam and Eve lived in a state of innocence in communication with God and in harmony with their physical environment. The expulsion from the Garden opened up a wide range of new possibilities for them and thus the problem of anxiety arose. Adam (the Hebrew word for man) is now free to determine through his actions the route of things. Naturally, there is a tension here. The human, created in God’s image, is an infinite being. Like God he also can choose and act according to his will. Simultaneously, though, he is a finite being since he is restricted by his body, particular socioeconomic conditions and so forth. This tension between the finite and infinite is the source of anxiety. But unlike a Hegelian analysis, Kierkegaard does not look for a way out from anxiety; on the contrary he stresses its positive role in the flourishing of the human. As he characteristically puts it: “Because he is a synthesis, he can be in anxiety; and the more profoundly he is in anxiety, the greater is the man” (Kierkegaard 1980:154). The prioritization of anxiety as a fundamental trait of the human being is a typical existentialist move, eager to assert the positive role of emotions for human life.

Perhaps the most famous work of Kierkegaard was Fear and Trembling, a short book which exhibits many of the issues raised by him throughout his career. Fear and Trembling retells the story of the attempted sacrifice of Isaac by his father Abraham. God tells Abraham that in order to prove his faith he has to sacrifice his only son. Abraham obeys, but at the last moment God intervenes and saves Isaac. What is the moral of the story? According to our moral beliefs, shouldn’t Abraham refuse to execute God’s vicious plan? Isn’t one of the fundamental beliefs of Christianity the respect to the life of other? The answer is naturally affirmative. Abraham should refuse God, and he should respect the ethical law. Then Abraham would be in a good relation with the Law itself as in the expression ‘a law abiding citizen’. On the contrary what Abraham tries to achieve is a personal relation with the author of the moral law. This author is neither a symbolic figure nor an abstract idea; he is someone with a name. The name of ’God’ is the unpronounceable Tetragrammaton (YHVE), the unpronounceability indicates the simultaneous closeness and distance of the great Other. The Christian God then, the author of the moral law at his will suspends the law and demands his unlawful wish be obeyed. Jacques Derrida notes that the temptation is now for Abraham the ethical law itself (Derrida 1998:162): he must resist ethics, this is the mad logic of God. The story naturally raises many problems. Is not such a subjectivist model of truth and religion plainly dangerous? What if someone was to support his acts of violence as a command of God? Kierkegaard’s response would be to suggest that it is only because Abraham loved Isaac with all his heart that the sacrifice could take place. “He must love Isaac with his whole soul….only then can he sacrifice him” (Kierkegaard 1983:74). Abraham’s faith is proved by the strength of his love for his son. However, this doesn’t fully answer the question of legitimacy, even if we agree that Abraham believed that God loved him so that he would somehow spare him. Kierkegaard also differentiates between the act of Abraham and the act of a tragic hero (like Agamemnon sacrificing his daughter Iphigenia). The tragic hero’s act is a product of calculation. What is better to do? What would be more beneficial? Abraham stands away from all sorts of calculations, he stands alone, that is, free in front of the horror religiosus, the price and the reward of faith.

b. Friedrich Nietzsche (1844-1900) as an Existentialist Philosopher

“I know my lot. Some day my name will be linked to the memory of something monstrous, of a crisis as yet unprecedented on earth…” (Nietzsche 2007:88). Remarkably, what in 1888 sounded like megalomania came some years later to be realized. The name ‘Nietzsche’ has been linked with an array of historical events, philosophical concepts and widespread popular legends. Above all, Nietzsche has managed somehow to associate his name with the turmoil of a crisis. For a while this crisis was linked to the events of WWII. The exploitation of his teaching by the Nazi ideologues (notably Alfred Rosenberg and Alfred Baeumler), although utterly misdirected, arguably had its source in Nietzsche’s own “aristocratic radicalism”. More generally, the crisis refers to the prospect of a future lacking of any meaning. This is a common theme for all the existentialists to be sure. The prospect of millennia of nihilism (the devaluation of the highest values) inaugurates for Nietzsche the era in which the human itself, for the first time in its history, is called to give meaning both to its own existence and to the existence of the world. This is an event of a cataclysmic magnitude, from now on there are neither guidelines to be followed, lighthouses to direct us, and no right answers but only experiments to be conducted with unknown results.

Many existentialists, in their attempt to differentiate the value of individual existence from the alienating effects of the masses, formed an uneasy relation with the value of the ‘everyday man’. The ‘common’ man was thought to be lacking in will, taste in matter of aesthetics, and individuality in the sense that the assertion of his existence comes exclusively from his participation in larger groups and from the ‘herd’ mentality with which these groups infuse their members. Nietzsche believed that men in society are divided and ordered according to their willingness and capacity to participate in a life of spiritual and cultural transformation. Certainly not everyone wishes this participation and Nietzsche’s condemnation of those unwilling to challenge their fundamental beliefs is harsh; however it would be a mistake to suggest that Nietzsche thought their presence dispensable. In various aphorisms he stresses the importance of the ‘common’ as a necessary prerequisite for both the growth and the value of the ‘exceptional’. Such an idea clashes with our ‘modern’ sensitivities (themselves a product of a particular training). However, one has to recognize that there are no philosophers without presuppositions, and that Nietzsche’s insistence on the value of the exceptional marks his own beginning and his own understanding of the mission of thought.

Despite the dubious politics that the crisis of meaning gave rise to, the crisis itself is only an after-effect of a larger and deeper challenge that Nietzsche’s work identifies and poses. For Nietzsche the crisis of meaning is inextricably linked to the crisis of religious consciousness in the West. Whereas for Kierkegaard the problem of meaning was to be resolved through the individual’s relation to the Divine, for Nietzsche the militantly anti-Christian, the problem of meaning is rendered possible at all because of the demise of the Divine. As he explains in The Genealogy of Morality, it is only after the cultivation of truth as a value by the priest that truth comes to question its own value and function. What truth discovers is that at the ground of all truth lies an unquestionable faith in the value of truth. Christianity is destroyed when it is pushed to tell the truth about itself, when the illusions of the old ideals are revealed. What is called ‘The death of God’ is also then the death of truth (though not of the value of truthfulness); this is an event of immense consequences for the future.

But one has to be careful here. Generations of readers, by concentrating on the event of the actual announcement of the ‘death of God’, have completely missed madman’s woeful mourning which follows the announcement. “‘Where is God?’ he cried; ‘I‘ll tell you! We have killed him – you and I! We are all his murderers. But how did we do this? How were we able to drink up the sea? Who gave us the sponge to wipe away the entire horizon? What were we doing when we unchained this earth from its sun? Where is it moving? Where are we moving to? Away from all suns?” (Nietzsche 2001:125). The above sentences are very far from constituting a cheerful declaration: no one is happy here! Nietzsche’s atheism has nothing to do with the naive atheism of others (for example Sartre) who rush to affirm their freedom as if their petty individuality were able to fill the vast empty space left by the absence of God. Nietzsche is not naive and because he is not naive he is rather pessimistic. What the death of God really announces is the demise of the human as we know it. One has to think of this break in the history of the human in Kantian terms. Kant famously described Enlightenment as “man’s emergence from his self-incurred immaturity” (Kant 1991:54). Similarly Nietzsche believes that the demise of the divine could be the opportunity for the emergence of a being which derives the meaning of its existence from within itself and not from some authority external to it. If the meaning of the human derived from God then, with the universe empty, man cannot take the place of the absent God. This empty space can only be filled by something greater and fuller, which in the Nietzschean jargon means the greatest unity of contradictory forces. That is the Übermensch (Overhuman) which for Nietzsche signifies the attempt towards the cultural production of a human being which will be aware of his dual descent – from animality and from rationality – without prioritizing either one, but keeping them in an agonistic balance so that through struggle new and exciting forms of human existence can be born.

Nietzsche was by training a Klassische Philologe (the rough equivalent Anglosaxon would be an expert in classics – the texts of the ancient Greek and Roman authors). Perhaps because of his close acquaintance with the ancient writers, he became sensitive to a quite different understanding of philosophical thinking to that of his contemporaries. For the Greeks, philosophical questioning takes place within the perspective of a certain choice of life. There is no ‘life’ and then quite separately the theoretical (theoria: from thea – view, and horan – to see) or ‘from a distance’ contemplation of phenomena. Philosophical speculation is the result of a certain way of life and the attempted justification of this life. Interestingly Kant encapsulates this attitude in the following passage: “When will you finally begin to live virtuously?’ said Plato to an old man who told him he was attending classes on virtue. The point is not always to speculate, but also ultimately to think about applying our knowledge. Today, however, he who lives in conformity with what he teaches is taken for a dreamer” (Kant in Hadot 2002:xiii). We have to understand Nietzsche’s relation to philosophy within this context not only because it illustrates a stylistically different contemplation but because it demonstrates an altogether different way of philosophizing. Thus in Twilight of the Idols Nietzsche accuses philosophers for their ‘Egyptism’, the fact that they turn everything into a concept under evaluation. “All that philosophers have been handling for thousands of years is conceptual mummies; nothing real has ever left their hands alive” (Nietzsche 1998:16). Philosophical concepts are valuable insofar as they serve a flourishing life, not as academic exercises. Under the new model of philosophy the old metaphysical and moral questions are to be replaced by new questions concerning history, genealogy, environmental conditions and so forth. Let us take a characteristic passage from 1888: “I am interested in a question on which the ‘salvation of humanity’ depends more than on any curio of the theologians: the question of nutrition. For ease of use, one can put it in the following terms: ‘how do you personally have to nourish yourself in order to attain your maximum of strength, of virtù in the Renaissance style, of moraline-free virtue?” (Nietzsche 2007:19).

What is Nietzsche telling us here? Two things: firstly that, following the tradition of Spinoza, the movement from transcendence to immanence passes through the rehabilitation of the body. To say that, however, does not imply a simple-minded materialism. When Spinoza tells “nobody as yet has determined the limits of the body’s capabilities” (Spinoza 2002: 280) he is not writing about something like bodily strength but to the possibility of an emergence of a body liberated from the sedimentation of culture and memory. This archetypical body is indeed as yet unknown and we stand in ignorance of its abilities. The second thing that Nietzsche is telling us in the above passage is that this new immanent philosophy necessarily requires a new ethics. One has to be clear here because of the many misunderstandings of Nietzschean ethics. Nietzsche is primarily a philosopher of ethics but ethics here refers to the possible justification of a way of life, which way of life in turn justifies human existence on earth. For Nietzsche, ethics does not refer to moral codes and guidelines on how to live one’s life. Morality, which Nietzsche rejects, refers to the obsessive need (a need or an instinct can also be learned according to Nietzsche) of the human to preserve its own species and to regard its species as higher than the other animals. In short morality is arrogant. A Nietzschean ethics is an ethics of modesty. It places the human back where it belongs, among the other animals. However to say that is not to equate the human with the animal. Unlike non-human animals men are products of history that is to say products of memory. That is their burden and their responsibility.

In the Genealogy of Morality Nietzsche explains morality as a system aiming at the taming of the human animal. Morality’s aim is the elimination of the creative power of animal instincts and the establishment of a life protected within the cocoon of ascetic ideals. These ‘ideals’ are all those values and ideologies made to protect man against the danger of nihilism, the state in which man finds no answer to the question of his existence. Morality clings to the preservation of the species ‘man’; morality stubbornly denies the very possibility of an open-ended future for humans. If we could summarize Nietzsche’s philosophical anthropology in a few words, we would say that for Nietzsche it is necessary to attempt (there are no guarantees here) to think of the human not as an end-in-itself but only as a means to something “…perfect, completely finished, happy, powerful, triumphant, that still leaves something to fear!” (Nietzsche 2007:25).

c. Martin Heidegger (1889-1976) as an Existentialist Philosopher

Heidegger exercised an unparalleled influence on modern thought. Without knowledge of his work recent developments in modern European philosophy (Sartre, Gadamer, Arendt, Marcuse, Derrida, Foucault et al.) simply do not make sense. He remains notorious for his involvement with National Socialism in the 1930s. Outside European philosophy, Heidegger is only occasionally taken seriously, and is sometimes actually ridiculed (famously the Oxford philosopher A.J. Ayer called him a ‘charlatan’).

In 1945 in Paris Jean-Paul Sartre gave a public lecture with the title ‘Existentialism is a Humanism’ where he defended the priority of action and the position that it is a man’s actions which define his humanity. In 1946, Jean Beaufret in a letter to Heidegger poses a number of questions concerning the link between humanism and the recent developments of existentialist philosophy in France. Heidegger’s response is a letter to Beaufret which in 1947 is published in a book form with the title ‘Letter on Humanism’. There he repudiates any possible connection of his philosophy with the existentialism of Sartre. The question for us here is the following: Is it possible, given Heidegger’s own repudiation of existentialism, still to characterise Heidegger’s philosophy as ‘existentialist’? The answer here is that Heidegger can be classified as an existentialist thinker despite all his differences from Sartre. Our strategy is to stress Heidegger’s connection with some key existentialist concerns, which we introduced above under the labels ‘Existence’, ‘Anxiety’ and the ‘Crowd’.

We have seen above that a principle concern of all existentialists was to affirm the priority of individual existence and to stress that human existence is to be investigated with methods other than those of the natural sciences. This is also one of Heidegger’s principle concerns. His magnum opus Being and Time is an investigation into the meaning of Being as that manifests itself through the human being, Dasein. The sciences have repeatedly asked ‘What is a man?’ ‘What is a car?’ ‘What is an emotion?’ they have nevertheless failed – and because of the nature of science, had to fail – to ask the question which grounds all those other questions. This question is what is the meaning of (that) Being which is not an entity (like other beings, for example a chair, a car, a rock) and yet through it entities have meaning at all? Investigating the question of the meaning of Being we discover that it arises only because it is made possible by the human being which poses the question. Dasein has already a (pre-conceptual) understanding of Being because it is the place where Being manifests itself. Unlike the traditional understanding of the human as a hypokeimenon (Aristotle) – what through the filtering of Greek thought by the Romans becomes substantia, that which supports all entities and qualities as their base and their ground – Dasein refers to the way which human beings are. ”The essence of Dasein lies in its existence” (Heidegger 1962: 67) and the existence of Dasein is not fixed like the existence of a substance is. This is why human beings locate a place which nevertheless remains unstable and unfixed. The virtual place that Dasein occupies is not empty. It is filled with beings which ontologically structure the very possibility of Dasein. Dasein exists as in-the-world. World is not something separate from Dasein; rather, Dasein cannot be understood outside the referential totality which constitutes it. Heidegger repeats here a familiar existentialist pattern regarding the situatedness of experience.

Sartre, by contrast, comes from the tradition of Descartes and to this tradition remains faithful. From Heidegger’s perspective, Sartre’s strategy of affirming the priority of existence over essence is a by-product of the tradition of Renaissance humanism which wishes to assert the importance of man as the highest and most splendid of finite beings. Sartrean existence refers to the fact that a human is whereas Heidegger’s ek-sistence refers to the way with which Dasein is thrown into a world of referential relations and as such Dasein is claimed by Being to guard its truth. Sartre, following Descartes, thinks of the human as a substance producing or sustaining entities, Heidegger on the contrary thinks of the human as a passivity which accepts the call of Being. “Man is not the lord of beings. Man is the shepherd of Being” (Heidegger 1993:245). The Heideggerian priority then is Being, and Dasein’s importance lies in its receptiveness to the call of Being.

For Kierkegaard anxiety defines the possibility of responsibility, the exodus of man from the innocence of Eden and his participation to history. But the birthplace of anxiety is the experience of nothingness, the state in which every entity is experienced as withdrawn from its functionality. “Nothing … gives birth to anxiety” (Kierkegaard 1980:41). In anxiety we do not fear something in particular but we experience the terror of a vacuum in which is existence is thrown. Existentialist thinkers are interested in anxiety because anxiety individualizes one (it is when I feel Angst more than everything that I come face to face with my own individual existence as distinct from all other entities around me). Heidegger thinks that one of the fundamental ways with which Dasein understands itself in the world is through an array of ‘moods’. Dasein always ‘finds itself’ (befinden sich) in a certain mood. Man is not a thinking thing de-associated from the world, as in Cartesian metaphysics, but a being which finds itself in various moods such as anxiety or boredom. For the Existentialists, primarily and for the most part I don’t exist because I think (recall Descartes’ famous formula) but because my moods reveal to me fundamental truths of my existence. Like Kierkegaard, Heidegger also believes that anxiety is born out of the terror of nothingness. “The obstinacy of the ‘nothing and nowhere within-the-world’ means as a phenomenon that the world as such is that in the face of which one has anxiety” (Heidegger 1962:231). For Kierkegaard the possibility of anxiety reveals man’s dual nature and because of this duality man can be saved. “If a human being were a beast or an angel, he could not be in anxiety. Because he is a synthesis, he can be in anxiety; and the more profoundly he is in anxiety, the greater is the man” (Kierkegaard 1980:155). Equally for Heidegger anxiety manifests Dasein’s possibility to live an authentic existence since it realizes that the crowd of ‘others’ (what Heidegger calls the ‘They’) cannot offer any consolation to the drama of existence.

In this article we have discussed the ambiguous or at times downright critical attitude of many existentialists toward the uncritical and unreflecting masses of people who, in a wholly anti-Kantian and thus also anti-Enlightenment move, locate the meaning of their existence in an external authority. They thus give up their (purported) autonomy as rational beings. For Heidegger, Dasein for the most part lives inauthentically in that Dasein is absorbed in a way of life produced by others, not by Dasein itself. “We take pleasure and enjoy ourselves as they [man] take pleasure; we read, see and judge about literature and art as they see and judge…” (Heidegger 1962:164). To be sure this mode of existence, the ‘They’ (Das Man) is one of the existentialia, it is an a priori condition of possibility of the Dasein which means that inauthenticity is inscribed into the mode of being of Dasein, it does not come from the outside as a bad influence which could be erased. Heidegger’s language is ambiguous on the problem of inauthenticity and the reader has to make his mind on the status of the ‘They’. A lot has been said on the possible connections of Heidegger’s philosophy with his political engagements. Although it is always a risky business to read the works of great philosophers as political manifestos, it seems prima facie evident that Heidegger’s thought in this area deserves the close investigation it has received.

Heidegger was a highly original thinker. His project was nothing less than the overcoming of Western metaphysics through the positing of the forgotten question of being. He stands in a critical relation to past philosophers but simultaneously he is heavily indebted to them, much more than he would like to admit. This is not to question his originality, it is to recognize that thought is not an ex nihilo production; it comes as a response to things past, and aims towards what is made possible through that past.

d. Jean-Paul Sartre (1905-1980) as an Existentialist Philosopher

In the public consciousness, at least, Sartre must surely be the central figure of existentialism. All the themes that we introduced above come together in his work. With the possible exception of Nietzsche, his writings are the most widely anthologised (especially the lovely, if oversimplifying, lecture ‘Existentialism and Humanism’) and his literary works are widely read (especially the novel Nausea) or performed. Although uncomfortable in the limelight, he was nevertheless the very model of a public intellectual, writing hundreds of short pieces for public dissemination and taking resolutely independent and often controversial stands on major political events. His writings that are most clearly existentialist in character date from Sartre’s early and middle period, primarily the 1930s and 1940s. From the 1950s onwards, Sartre moved his existentialism towards a philosophy the purpose of which was to understand the possibility of a genuinely revolutionary politics.

Sartre was in his late 20s when he first encountered phenomenology, specifically the philosophical ideas of Edmund Husserl. (We should point out that Heidegger was also deeply influenced by Husserl, but it is less obvious in the language he employs because he drops the language of consciousness and acts.) Of particular importance, Sartre thought, was Husserl’s notion of intentionality. In Sartre’s interpretation of this idea, consciousness is not to be identified with a thing (for example a mind, soul or brain), that is to say some kind of a repository of ideas and images of things. Rather, consciousness is nothing but a directedness towards things. Sartre found a nice way to sum up the notion of the intentional object: If I love her, I love her because she is lovable (Sartre 1970:4-5). Within my experience, her lovableness is not an aspect of my image of her, rather it is a feature of her (and ultimately a part of the world) towards which my consciousness directs itself. The things I notice about her (her smile, her laugh) are not originally neutral, and then I interpret the idea of them as ‘lovely’, they are aspects of her as lovable. The notion that consciousness is not a thing is vital to Sartre. Indeed, consciousness is primarily to be characterised as nothing: it is first and foremost not that which it is conscious of. (Sartre calls human existence the ‘for-itself’, and the being of things the ‘in-itself’.) Because it is not a thing, it is not subject to the laws of things; specifically, it is not part of a chain of causes and its identity is not akin to that of a substance. Above we suggested that a concern with the nature of existence, and more particularly a concern with the distinctive nature of human existence, are defining existentialist themes.

Moreover, qua consciousness, and not a thing that is part of the causal chain, I am free. From moment to moment, my every action is mine alone to choose. I will of course have a past ‘me’ that cannot be dispensed with; this is part of my ‘situation’. However, again, I am first and foremost not my situation. Thus, at every moment I choose whether to continue on that life path, or to be something else. Thus, my existence (the mere fact that I am) is prior to my essence (what I make of myself through my free choices). I am thus utterly responsible for myself. If my act is not simply whatever happens to come to mind, then my action may embody a more general principle of action. This principle too is one that I must have freely chosen and committed myself to. It is an image of the type of life that I believe has value. (In these ways, Sartre intersects with the broadly Kantian account of freedom which we introduced above in our thematic section.) As situated, I also find myself surrounded by such images – from religion, culture, politics or morality – but none compels my freedom. (All these forces that seek to appropriate my freedom by objectifying me form Sartre’s version of the crowd theme.) I exist as freedom, primarily characterised as not determined, so my continuing existence requires the ever renewed exercise of freedom (thus, in our thematic discussion above, the notion from Spinoza and Leibniz of existence as a striving-to-exist). Thus also, my non-existence, and the non-existence of everything I believe in, is only a free choice away. I (in the sense of an authentic human existence) am not what I ‘am’ (the past I have accumulated, the things that surround me, or the way that others view me). I am alone in my responsibility; my existence, relative to everything external that might give it meaning, is absurd. Face to face with such responsibility, I feel ‘anxiety’. Notice that although Sartre’s account of situatedness owes much to Nietzsche and Heidegger, he sees it primarily in terms of what gives human freedom its meaning and its burden. Nietzsche and Heidegger, in contrast, view such a conception of freedom as naively metaphysical.

Suppose, however, that at some point I am conscious of myself in a thing-like way. For example, I say ‘I am a student’ (treating myself as having a fixed, thing-like identity) or ‘I had no choice’ (treating myself as belonging to the causal chain). I am ascribing a fixed identity or set of qualities to myself, much as I would say ‘that is a piece of granite’. In that case I am existing in denial of my distinctively human mode of existence; I am fleeing from my freedom. This is inauthenticity or ‘bad faith’. As we shall see, inauthenticity is not just an occasional pitfall of human life, but essential to it. Human existence is a constant falling away from an authentic recognition of its freedom. Sartre here thus echoes the notion in Heidegger than inauthenticity is a condition of possibility of human existence.

Intentionality manifests itself in another important way. Rarely if ever am I simply observing the world; instead I am involved in wanting to do something, I have a goal or purpose. Here, intentional consciousness is not a static directedness towards things, but is rather an active projection towards the future. Suppose that I undertake as my project marrying my beloved. This is an intentional relation to a future state of affairs. As free, I commit myself to this project and must reaffirm that commitment at every moment. It is part of my life project, the image of human life that I offer to myself and to others as something of value. Notice, however, that my project involves inauthenticity. I project myself into the future where I will be married to her – that is, I define myself as ‘married’, as if I were a fixed being. Thus there is an essential tension to all projection. On the one hand, the mere fact that I project myself into the future is emblematic of my freedom; only a radically free consciousness can project itself. I exist as projecting towards the future which, again, I am not. Thus, I am (in the sense of an authentic self) what I am not (because my projecting is always underway towards the future). On the other hand, in projecting I am projecting myself as something, that is, as a thing that no longer projects, has no future, is not free. Every action, then, is both an expression of freedom and also a snare of freedom. Projection is absurd: I seek to become the impossible object, for-itself-in-itself, a thing that is both free and a mere thing. Born of this tension is a recognition of freedom, what it entails, and its essential fragility. Thus, once again, we encounter existential anxiety. (In this article, we have not stressed the importance of the concept of time for existentialism, but it should not be overlooked: witness one of Nietzsche’s most famous concepts (eternal recurrence) and the title of Heidegger’s major early work (Being and Time).)

In my intentional directedness towards my beloved I find her ‘loveable’. This too, though, is an objectification. Within my intentional gaze, she is loveable in much the same way that granite is hard or heavy. Insofar as I am in love, then, I seek to deny her freedom. Insofar, however, as I wish to be loved by her, then she must be free to choose me as her beloved. If she is free, she escapes my love; if not, she cannot love. It is in these terms that Sartre analyses love in Part Three of Being and Nothingness. Love here is a case study in the basic forms of social relation. Sartre is thus moving from an entirely individualistic frame of reference (my self, my freedom and my projects) towards a consideration of the self in concrete relations with others. Sartre is working through – in a way he would shortly see as being inadequate – the issues presented by the Hegelian dialectic of recognition, which we mentioned above. This ‘hell’ of endlessly circling acts of freedom and objectification is brilliantly dramatised in Sartre’s play No Exit.

A few years later at the end of the 1940s, Sartre wrote what has been published as Notebooks for an Ethics. Sartre (influenced in the meantime by the criticisms of Merleau-Ponty and de Beauvoir, and by his increasing commitment to collectivist politics) elaborated greatly his existentialist account of relations with others, taking the Hegelian idea more seriously. He no longer thinks of concrete relations so pessimistically. While Nietzsche and Heidegger both suggest the possibility of an authentic being with others, both leave it seriously under-developed. For our purposes, there are two key ideas in the Notebooks. The first is that my projects can be realised only with the cooperation of others; however, that cooperation presupposes their freedom (I cannot make her love me), and their judgements about me must concern me. Therefore permitting and nurturing the freedom of others must be a central part of all my projects. Sartre thus commits himself against any political, social or economic forms of subjugation. Second, there is the possibility of a form of social organisation and action in which each individual freely gives him or herself over to a joint project: a ‘city of ends’ (this is a reworking of Kant’s idea of the ‘kingdom of ends’, found in the Grounding for the Metaphysics of Morals). An authentic existence, for Sartre, therefore means two things. First, it is something like a ‘style’ of existing – one that at every moment is anxious, and that means fully aware of the absurdity and fragility of its freedom. Second, though, there is some minimal level of content to any authentic project: whatever else my project is, it must also be a project of freedom, for myself and for others.

e. Simone de Beauvoir (1908-1986) as an Existentialist Philosopher

Simone de Beauvoir was the youngest student ever to pass the demanding agrégation at the prestigious École Normale Supérieure. Subsequently a star Normalienne, she was a writer, philosopher, feminist, lifelong partner of Jean-Paul Sartre, notorious for her anti-bourgeois way of living and her free sexual relationships which included among others a passionate affair with the American writer Nelson Algren. Much ink has been spilled debating whether de Beauvoir’s work constitutes a body of independent philosophical work, or is a reformulation of Sartre’s work. The debate rests of course upon the fundamental misconception that wants a body of work to exist and develop independently of (or uninfluenced by) its intellectual environment. Such ‘objectivity’ is not only impossible but also undesirable: such a body of work would be ultimately irrelevant since it would be non-communicable. So the question of de Beauvoir’s ‘independence’ could be dismissed here as irrelevant to the philosophical questions that her work raises.

In 1943 Being and Nothingness, the groundwork of the Existentialist movement in France was published. There Sartre gave an account of freedom as ontological constitutive of the subject. One cannot but be free: this is the kernel of the Sartrean conception of freedom. In 1945 Merleau-Ponty’s Phenomenology of Perception is published. There, as well as in an essay from the same year titled ‘The war has taken place’, Merleau-Ponty heavily criticizes the Sartrean stand, criticising it as a reformulation of basic Stoic tenets. One cannot assume freedom in isolation from the freedom of others. Action is participatory: “…my freedom is interwoven with that of others by way of the world” (Merleau-Ponty in Stewart 1995:315). Moreover action takes place within a certain historical context. For Merleau-Ponty the subjective free-will is always in a dialectical relationship with its historical context. In 1947 Simone de Beauvoir’s Ethics of Ambiguity is published. The book is an introduction to existentialism but also a subtle critique of Sartre’s position on freedom, and a partial extension of existentialism towards the social. Although de Beauvoir will echo Merleau-Ponty’s criticism regarding the essential interrelation of the subjects, nevertheless she will leave unstressed the importance that the social context plays in the explication of moral problems. Like Sartre it is only later in her life that this will be acknowledged. In any case, de Beauvoir’s book precipitates in turn a major rethink on Sartre’s part, and the result is the Notebooks for an Ethics.

In Ethics of Ambiguity de Beauvoir offers a picture of the human subject as constantly oscillating between facticity and transcendence. Whereas the human is always already restricted by the brute facts of his existence, nevertheless it always aspires to overcome its situation, to choose its freedom and thus to create itself. This tension must be considered positive, and not restrictive of action. It is exactly because the ontology of the human is a battleground of antithetical movements (a view consistent with de Beauvoir’s Hegelianism) that the subject must produce an ethics which will be continuous with its ontological core. The term for this tension is ambiguity. Ambiguity is not a quality of the human as substance, but a characterisation of human existence. We are ambiguous beings destined to throw ourselves into the future while simultaneously it is our very own existence that throws us back into facticity. That is to say, back to the brute fact that we are in a sense always already destined to fail – not in this or that particular project but to fail as pure and sustained transcendence. It is exactly because of (and through) this fundamental failure that we realize that our ethical relation to the world cannot be self-referential but must pass through the realization of the common destiny of the human as a failed and interrelated being.

De Beauvoir, unlike Sartre, was a scholarly reader of Hegel. Her position on an existential ethics is thus more heavily influenced by Hegel’s view in the Phenomenology of Spirit concerning the moment of recognition (Hegel 1977:111). There Hegel describes the movement in which self-consciousness produces itself by positing another would be self-consciousness, not as a mute object (Gegen-stand) but as itself self-consciousness. The Hegelian movement remains one of the most fascinating moments in the history of philosophy since it is for the first time that the constitution of the self does not take place from within the self (as happens with Descartes, for whom the only truth is the truth of my existence; or Leibniz, for whom the monads are ‘windowless’; or Fichte, for whom the ‘I’ is absolutely self-constitutive) but from the outside. It is, Hegel tells us, only because someone else recognizes me as a subject that I can be constituted as such. Outside the moment of recognition there is no self-consciousness. De Beauvoir takes to heart the Hegelian lesson and tries to formulate an ethics from it.

What would this ethics be? As in Nietzsche, ethics refers to a way of life (a βίος), as opposed to morality which concerns approved or condemned behaviour. Thus there are no recipes for ethics. Drawn from Hegel’s moment of recognition, de Beauvoir acknowledges that the possibility of human flourishing is based firstly upon the recognition of the existence of the other (“Man can find a justification of his own existence only in the existence of the other men” (Beauvoir 1976:72) and secondly on the recognition that my own flourishing (or my ability to pose projects, in the language of existentialists) passes through the possibility of a common flourishing. “Only the freedom of others keeps each one of us from hardening in the absurdity of facticity,” (Beauvoir 1976:71) de Beauvoir writes; or again “To will oneself free is also to will others free” (Beauvoir 1976:73). The Ethics of Ambiguity ends by declaring the necessity of assuming one’s freedom and the assertion that it is only through action that freedom makes itself possible. This is not a point to be taken light-heartedly. It constitutes a movement of opposition against a long tradition of philosophy understanding itself as theoria: the disinterested contemplation on the nature of the human and the world. De Beauvoir, in common with most existentialists, understands philosophy as praxis: involved action in the world and participation in the course of history. It is out of this understanding that The Second Sex is born.

In 1949 Le Deuxième Sexe is published in France. In English in 1953 it appeared as The Second Sex in an abridged translation. The book immediately became a best seller and later a founding text of Second Wave Feminism (the feminist movement from the early 60’s to the 70’s inspired by the civil rights movement and focusing at the theoretical examination of the concepts of equality, inequality, the role of family, justice and so forth). More than anything, The Second Sex constitutes a study in applied existentialism where the abstract concept ‘Woman’ gives way to the examination of the lives of everyday persons struggling against oppression and humiliation. When de Beauvoir says that there is no such thing as a ‘Woman’ we have to hear the echo of the Kierkegaardian assertion of the single individual against the abstractions of Hegelian philosophy, or similarly Sartre’s insistence on the necessity of the prioritization of the personal lives of self-creating people (what Sartre calls ‘existence’) as opposed to a pre-established ideal of what humans should be like (what Sartre calls ‘essence’). The Second Sex is an exemplary text showing how a philosophical movement can have real, tangible effects on the lives of many people, and is a magnificent exercise in what philosophy could be.

“I hesitated a long time before writing a book on woman. The subject is irritating, especially for women…” (Beauvoir 2009:3). The Second Sex begins with the most obvious (but rarely posed) question: What is woman? De Beauvoir finds that at present there is no answer to that question. The reason is that tradition has always thought of woman as the other of man. It is only man that constitutes himself as a subject (as the Absolute de Beauvoir says), and woman defines herself only through him. “She determines and differentiates herself in relation to man, and he does not in relation to her; she is the inessential in front of the essential…” (Beauvoir 2009:6). But why is it that woman has initially accepted or tolerated this process whereby she becomes the other of man? De Beauvoir does not give a consoling answer; on the contrary, by turning to Sartre’s notion of bad faith (which refers to the human being’s anxiety in front of the responsibility entailed by the realization of its radical freedom) she thinks that women at times are complicit to their situation. It is indeed easier for one – anyone – to assume the role of an object (for example a housewife ‘kept’ by her husband) than to take responsibility for creating him or herself and creating the possibilities of freedom for others. Naturally the condition of bad faith is not always the case. Often women found themselves in a sociocultural environment which denied them the very possibility of personal flourishing (as happens with most of the major religious communities). A further problem that women face is that of understanding themselves as a unity which would enable them to assume the role of their choosing. “Proletarians say ‘we’. So do blacks” (Beauvoir 2009:8). By saying ‘we’ they assume the role of the subject and turn everyone else into ‘other’. Women are unable to utter this ‘we’. “They live dispersed among men, tied by homes, work, economic interests and social conditions to certain men – fathers or husbands – more closely than to other women. As bourgeois women, they are in solidarity with bourgeois men and not with women proletarians; as white women, they are in solidarity with white men and not with black women” (Beauvoir 2009:9). Women primarily align themselves to their class or race and not to other women. The female identity is “very much bound up with the identity of the men around them…” (Reynolds 2006:145).

One of the most celebrated moments in The Second Sex is the much quoted phrase: “One is not born, but rather becomes, woman” (Beauvoir 2009:293). She explains: “No biological, physical or economic destiny defines the figure that the human female takes on in society; it is civilization as a whole that elaborates this intermediary product between the male and the eunuch that is called feminine” (Beauvoir 2009:293). For some feminists this clearly inaugurates the problematic of the sex-gender distinction (where sex denotes the biological identity of the person and gender the cultural attribution of properties to the sexed body). Simply put, there is absolutely nothing that determines the ‘assumed’ femininity of the woman (how a woman acts, feels, behaves) – everything that we have come to think as ‘feminine’ is a social construction not a natural given. Later feminists like Monique Wittig and Judith Butler will argue that ‘sex’ is already ‘gender’ in the sense that a sexed body exists always already within a cultural nexus that defines it. Thus the sex assignment (a doctor pronouncing the sex of the baby) is a naturalized (but not at all natural) normative claim which delivers the human into a world of power relations.

f. Albert Camus (1913-1960) as an Existentialist Philosopher

Albert Camus was a French intellectual, writer and journalist. His multifaceted work as well as his ambivalent relation to both philosophy and existentialism makes every attempt to classify him a rather risky operation. A recipient of the 1957 Nobel Prize for Literature primarily for his novels, he is also known as a philosopher due to his non-literary work and his relation with Jean-Paul Sartre. And yet his response was clear: “I am not a philosopher, because I don’t believe in reason enough to believe in a system. What interests me is knowing how we must behave, and more precisely, how to behave when one does not believe in God or reason” (Camus in Sherman 2009: 1). The issue is not just about the label ‘existentialist’. It rather points to a deep tension within the current of thought of all thinkers associated with existentialism. The question is: With how many voices can thought speak? As we have already seen, the thinkers of existentialism often deployed more than one. Almost all of them share a deep suspicion to a philosophy operating within reason as conceived of by the Enlightenment. Camus shares this suspicion and his so called philosophy of the absurd intends to set limits to the overambitions of Western rationality. Reason is absurd in that it believes that it can explain the totality of the human experience whereas it is exactly its inability for explanation that, for example, a moment of fall designates. Thus in his novel “The Fall” the protagonist’s tumultuous narrative reveals the overtaking of a life of superficial regularity by the forces of darkness and irrationality. “A bourgeois hell, inhabited of course by bad dreams” (Camus 2006:10). In a similar fashion Camus has also repudiated his connection with existentialism. “Non, je ne suis pas existentialist” is the title of a famous interview that he gave for the magazine Les Nouvelles Littéraires on the 15 of November, 1945. The truth of the matter is that Camus’ rejection of existentialism is directed more toward Sartre’s version of it rather than toward a dismissal of the main problems that the existential thinkers faced. Particularly, Camus was worried that Sartre’s deification of history (Sartre’s proclaimed Marxism) would be incompatible with the affirmation of personal freedom. Camus accuses Hegel (subsequently Marx himself) of reducing man to history and thus denying man the possibility of creating his own history, that is, affirming his freedom.

Philosophically, Camus is known for his conception of the absurd. Perhaps we should clarify from the very beginning what the absurd is not. The absurd is not nihilism. For Camus the acceptance of the absurd does not lead to nihilism (according to Nietzsche nihilism denotes the state in which the highest values devalue themselves) or to inertia, but rather to their opposite: to action and participation. The notion of the absurd signifies the space which opens up between, on the one hand, man’s need for intelligibility and, on the other hand, ‘the unreasonable silence of the world’ as he beautifully puts it. In a world devoid of God, eternal truths or any other guiding principle, how could man bear the responsibility of a meaning-giving activity? The absurd man, like an astronaut looking at the earth from above, wonders whether a philosophical system, a religion or a political ideology is able to make the world respond to the questioning of man, or rather whether all human constructions are nothing but the excessive face-paint of a clown which is there to cover his sadness. This terrible suspicion haunts the absurd man. In one of the most memorable openings of a non-fictional book he states: “There is but one truly serious philosophical problem and that is suicide. Judging whether life is or is not worth living amounts to answering the fundamental question of philosophy. All the rest – whether or not the world has three dimensions, whether the mind has nine or twelve categories – comes afterwards. These are games; one must first answer” (Camus 2000:11). The problem of suicide (a deeply personal problem) manifests the exigency of a meaning-giving response. Indeed for Camus a suicidal response to the problem of meaning would be the confirmation that the absurd has taken over man’s inner life. It would mean that man is not any more an animal going after answers, in accordance with some inner drive that leads him to act in order to endow the world with meaning. The suicide has become but a passive recipient of the muteness of the world. “…The absurd … is simultaneously awareness and rejection of death” (Camus 2000:54). One has to be aware of death – because it is precisely the realization of man’s mortality that pushes someone to strive for answers – and one has ultimately to reject death – that is, reject suicide as well as the living death of inertia and inaction. At the end one has to keep the absurd alive, as Camus says. But what does it that mean?

In The Myth of Sisyphus Camus tells the story of the mythical Sisyphus who was condemned by the Gods to ceaselessly roll a rock to the top of a mountain and then have to let it fall back again of its own weight. “Sisyphus, proletarian of the gods, powerless and rebellious, knows the whole extent of his wretched condition: it is what he thinks of during his descent. The lucidity that was to constitute his torture at the same time crowns his victory. There is no fate that cannot be surmounted by scorn” (Camus 2000:109). One must imagine then Sisyphus victorious: fate and absurdity have been overcome by a joyful contempt. Scorn is the appropriate response in the face of the absurd; another name for this ‘scorn’ though would be artistic creation. When Camus says: “One does not discover the absurd without being tempted to write a manual of happiness” (Camus 2000:110) he writes about a moment of exhilarated madness, which is the moment of the genesis of the artistic work. Madness, but nevertheless profound – think of the function of the Fool in Shakespeare’s King Lear as the one who reveals to the king the most profound truths through play, mimicry and songs. Such madness can overcome the absurd without cancelling it altogether.

Almost ten years after the publication of The Myth of Sisyphus Camus publishes his second major philosophical work, The Rebel (1951). Camus continues the problematic which had begun with The Myth of Sisyphus. Previously, revolt or creation had been considered the necessary response to the absurdity of existence. Here, Camus goes on to examine the nature of rebellion and its multiple manifestations in history. In The Myth of Sisyphus, in truly Nietzschean fashion, Camus had said: “There is but one useful action, that of remaking man and the earth” (Camus 2000:31). However, in The Rebel, reminiscent of Orwell’s Animal Farm, one of the first points he makes is the following: “The slave starts by begging for justice and ends by wanting to wear a crown. He too wants to dominate” (Camus 2000b:31). The problem is that while man genuinely rebels against both unfair social conditions and, as Camus says, against the whole of creation, nevertheless in the practical administration of such revolution, man comes to deny the humanity of the other in an attempt to impose his own individuality. Take for example the case of the infamous Marquis de Sade which Camus explores. In Sade, contradictory forces are at work (see The 120 Days of Sodom). On the one hand, Sade wishes the establishment of a (certainly mad) community with desire as the ultimate master, and on the other hand this very desire consumes itself and all the subjects who stand in its way.

Camus goes on to examine historical manifestations of rebellion, the most prominent case being that of the French Revolution. Camus argues that the revolution ended up taking the place of the transcendent values which it sought to abolish. An all-powerful notion of justice now takes the place formerly inhabited by God. Rousseau’s infamous suggestion that under the rule of ‘general will’ everyone would be ‘forced to be free’ (Rousseau in Foley 2008:61) opens the way to the crimes committed after the revolution. Camus fears that all revolutions end with the re-establishment of the State. “…Seventeen eighty-nine brings Napoleon; 1848 Napoleon III; 1917 Stalin; the Italian disturbances of the twenties, Mussolini; the Weimar Republic, Hitler” (Camus 2000b:146). Camus is led to examine the Marxist view of history as a possible response to the failed attempts at the establishment of a true revolutionary regime. Camus examines the similarities between the Christian and the Marxist conception of history. They both exhibit a bourgeois preoccupation with progress. In the name of the future everything can be justified: “the future is the only kind of property that the masters willingly concede to the slaves” (Camus 2000b:162). History according to both views is the linear progress from a set beginning to a definite end (the metaphysical salvation of man or the materialistic salvation of him in the future Communist society). Influenced by Kojève’s reading of Hegel, Camus interprets this future, classless society as the ‘end of history’. The ‘end of history’ suggests that when all contradictions cease then history itself will come to an end. This is, Camus argues, essentially nihilistic: history, in effect, accepts that meaning creation is no longer possible and commits suicide. Because historical revolutions are for the most part nihilistic movements, Camus suggests that it is the making-absolute of the values of the revolution that necessarily lead to their negation. On the contrary a relative conception of these values will be able to sustain a community of free individuals who have not forgotten that every historical rebellion has begun by affirming a proto-value (that of human solidarity) upon which every other value can be based.

3. The Influence of Existentialism

a. The Arts and Psychology

In the field of visual arts existentialism exercised an enormous influence, most obviously on the movement of Expressionism. Expressionism began in Germany at the beginning of the 20^th century. With its emphasis on subjective experience, Angst and intense emotionality, German expressionism sought to go beyond the naiveté of realist representation and to deal with the anguish of the modern man (exemplified in the terrible experiences of WWI). Many of the artists of Expressionism read Nietzsche intensively and following Nietzsche’s suggestion for a transvaluation of values experimented with alternative lifestyles. Erich Heckel’s woodcut “Friedrich Nietzsche” from 1905 is a powerful reminder of the movement’s connection to Existentialist thought. Abstract expressionism (which included artists such as de Kooning and Pollock, and theorists such as Rosenberg) continued with some of the same themes in the United States from the 1940s and tended to embrace existentialism as one of its intellectual guides, especially after Sartre’s US lecture tour in 1946 and a production of No Exit in New York.

German Expressionism was particularly important during the birth of the new art of cinema. Perhaps the closest cinematic work to Existentialist concerns remains F.W. Murnau’s The Last Laugh (1924) in which the constantly moving camera (which prefigures the ‘rule’ of the hand-held camera of the Danish Dogma 95) attempts to arrest the spiritual anguish of a man who suddenly finds himself in a meaningless world. Expressionism became a world-wide style within cinema, especially as film directors like Lang fled Germany and ended up in Hollywood. Jean Genet’s Un chant d’amour (1950) is a moving poetic exploration of desire. In the sordid, claustrophobic cells of a prison the inmates’ craving for intimacy takes place against the background of an unavoidable despair for existence itself. European directors such as Bergman and Godard are often associated with existentialist themes. Godard’s Vivre sa vie (My Life to Live, 1962) is explicit in its exploration of the nature of freedom under conditions of extreme social and personal pressure. In the late 20^th and early 21^st centuries existentialist ideas became common in mainstream cinema, pervading the work of writers and directors such as Woody Allen, Richard Linklater, Charlie Kaufman and Christopher Nolan.

Given that Sartre and Camus were both prominent novelists and playwrights, the influence of existentialism on literature is not surprising. However, the influence was also the other way. Novelists such as Dostoevsky or Kafka, and the dramatist Ibsen, were often cited by mid-century existentialists as important precedents, right along with Kierkegaard and Nietzsche. Dostoevsky creates a character Ivan Karamazov (in The Brothers Karamazov, 1880) who holds the view that if God is dead, then everything is permitted; both Nietzsche and Sartre discuss Dostoevsky with enthusiasm. Within drama, the theatre of the absurd and most obviously Beckett were influenced by existentialist ideas; later playwrights such as Albee, Pinter and Stoppard continue this tradition.

One of the key figures of 20^th century psychology, Sigmund Freud, was indebted to Nietzsche especially for his analysis of the role of psychology within culture and history, and for his view of cultural artefacts such as drama or music as ‘unconscious’ documentations of psychological tensions. But a more explicit taking up of existentialist themes is found in the broad ‘existentialist psychotherapy’ movement. A common theme within this otherwise very diverse group is that previous psychology misunderstood the fundamental nature of the human and especially its relation to others and to acts of meaning-giving; thus also, previous psychology had misunderstood what a ‘healthy’ attitude to self, others and meaning might be. Key figures here include Swiss psychologists Ludwig Binswanger and later Menard Boss, both of who were enthusiastic readers of Heidegger; the Austrian Frankl, who invented the method of logotherapy; in England, Laing and Cooper, who were explicitly influenced by Sartre; and in the United States, Rollo May, who stresses the ineradicable importance of anxiety.

b. Philosophy

As a whole, existentialism has had relatively little direct influence within philosophy. In Germany, existentialism (and especially Heidegger) was criticised for being obscure, abstract or even mystical in nature. This criticism was made especially by Adorno in The Jargon of Authenticity, and in Dog Years, novelist Gunter Grass gives a Voltaire-like, savage satire of Heidegger. The criticism was echoed by many in the analytic tradition. Heidegger and the existentialist were also taken to task for paying insufficient attention to social and political structures or values, with dangerous results. In France, philosophers like Sartre were criticised by those newly under the influence of structuralism for paying insufficient attention to the nature of language and to impersonal structures of meaning. In short, philosophy moved on, and in different directions. Individual philosophers remain influential, however: Nietzsche and Heidegger in particular are very much ‘live’ topics in philosophy, even in the 21^st century.

However, there are some less direct influences that remain important. Let us raise three examples. Both the issue of freedom in relation to situation, and that of the philosophical significance of what otherwise might appear to be extraneous contextual factors, remain key, albeit in dramatically altered formulation, within the work of Michel Foucault or Alain Badiou, two figures central to late 20^th century European thought. Likewise, the philosophical importance that the existentialists placed upon emotion has been influential, legitimising a whole domain of philosophical research even by philosophers who have no interest in existentialism. Similarly, existentialism was a philosophy that insisted philosophy could and should deal very directly with ‘real world’ topics such as sex, death or crime, topics that had most frequently been approached abstractly within the philosophical tradition. Mary Warnock wrote on existentialism and especially Sartre, for example, while also having an incredibly important and public role within recent applied ethics.

4. References and Further Reading

a. General Introductions

Warnock Mary. Existentialism (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1970)
Barrett William. Irrational Man: A Study in Existential Philosophy (New York: Anchor House, 1990)
Cooper E. David. Existentialism (Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell, 1999)
Reynolds Jack. Understanding Existentialism (Stocksfield: Acumen, 2006)
Earnshaw Steven. Existentialism: A Guide for the Perplexed (London: Continuum, 2006)

b. Anthologies

Kauffman Walter. Existentialism from Dostoevsky to Sartre (New York: Penguin, 1975)
Paul S. MacDonald. The Existentialist Reader – An Anthology of Key Texts (Edinburgh: Edinburg University Press, 2000)
Solomon C. Robert. Existentialism (USA: Oxford University Press, 2004)

c. Primary Bibliography

Beauvoir de Simone. The Ethics of Ambiguity (New York: Citadel Press, 1976)
Beauvoir de Simone. The Second Sex (London: Jonathan Cape, 2009)
Camus Albert. The Myth of Sisyphus (London: Penguin, 2000)
Camus Albert. The Rebel (London: Penguin, 2000b)
Camus Albert. The Fall, (London: Penguin, 2006)
Heidegger Martin, Introduction to Metaphysics (New Heaven & London: Yale University Press,2000)
Heidegger Martin. Letter on Humanism: in Heidegger Martin. Basic Writings, (London: Routledge, 1993)
Heidegger Martin. Being and Time (Oxford: Blackwell, 1962)
Heidegger Martin. Identity and Difference (Chicago: Chicago University Press, 2002)
Kierkegaard Søren. The Concept of Anxiety (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1980)
Kierkegaard Søren. Fear and Trembling (New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 1983)
Kierkegaard Søren. Papers and Journals: A Selection, (London: Penguin Book, 1996)
Nietzsche Friedrich. Ecce Homo (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007)
Nietzsche Friedrich. The Gay Science (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001)
Nietzsche Friedrich. Twilight of the Idols (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008)
Nietzsche Friedrich. On the Genealogy of Morality (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007)
Sartre Jean-Paul. Being and Nothingness (London and New York: Routledge, 2003)
Sartre Jean-Paul, “Intentionality: A fundamental idea of Husserl’s Phenomenology.” Trans. by Joseph P. Fell, Journal of the British Society for Phenomenology, 1970, Vol. 1, No. 2

d. Secondary Bibliography

Camus
Todd Oliver. Albert Camus – A Life (London: Vintage, 1998)
Sherman David. Camus (Oxford: Blackwell, 2009)
Foley John. Albert Camus – From the Absurd to Revolt (Stocksfield: Accumen, 2009)
Sartre
Cox Gary. Sartre – A guide for the Perplexed (London: Continuum, 2006)
Gardner Sebastian. Sartre’s Being and Nothingness (London: Continuum, 2009)
Stewart John, “Merleau-Ponty’s criticisms of Sartre’s theory of freedom.” Philosophy Today, 39:3 (1995:Fall)
Heidegger
Beistegui de Miguel. The New Heidegger (London & New York: Continuum, 2005)
Marx Werner. Heidegger and the Tradition (Evanson: Northwestern University Press, 1971)
Polt Richard. Heidegger – An Inroduction (London: UCL Press, 1999)
Safranski Rüdiger. Martin Heidegger: Between Good and Evil (Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1999)
Watts Michael. The philosophy of Heidegger (Durham: Acumen, 2011)
Nietzsche
Ansell-Pearson Keith. An Introduction to Nietzsche as Political Thinker (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994)
Burnham Douglas. Reading Nietzsche – An Analysis of Beyond Good an Evil (Stocksfield: Accumen, 2007)
Burnham Douglas and Jesinghausen Martin. Nietzsche’s Thus Spoke Zarathustra (Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 2010)
Burnham Douglas and Jesinghausen Martin. Nietzsche’s The Birth of Tragedy (London: Continuum, 2010)
Safranski Rüdiger. Nietzsche – A Philosophical Biography (London: Granta Books, 2002)
Kierkegaard
Pattison George. The Philosophy of Kierkegaard (Chesham: Acumen, 2005)
Weston Michael. Kierkegaard and Modern Continental Philosophy: An Introduction (London: Routledge, 1994)

e. Other Works Cited

Hegel G.W.F. Phenomenology of Spirit, (Oxford and New York, Oxford University Press, 1977)
Spinoza Baruch Ethics in: Spinoza Baruch Complete Works, (Indianapolis, Hackett Publishing, 2002)
Kant Immanuel An Answer to the Question: ‘What is Enlightenment?’ in Kant Immanuel Political Writings, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991)

Author Information

Douglas Burnham
Email: h.d.burnham@staffs.ac.uk
Staffordshire University
United Kingdom

and

George Papandreopoulos
Email: g.papandreopoulos@staffs.ac.uk
Staffordshire University
United Kingdom

Epistemic Luck

Epistemic luck is a generic notion used to describe any of a number of ways in which it can be accidental, coincidental, or fortuitous that a person has a true belief. For example, one can form a true belief as a result of a lucky guess, as when one believes through guesswork that “C” is the right answer to a multiple-choice question and one’s belief just happens to be correct. One can form a true belief via wishful thinking; for example, an optimist’s belief that it will not rain may luckily turn out to be correct, despite forecasts for heavy rain all day. One can reason from false premises to a belief that coincidentally happens to be true. One can accidentally arrive at a true belief through invalid or fallacious reasoning. And one can fortuitously arrive at a true belief from testimony that was intended to mislead but unwittingly reported the truth. In all of these cases, it is just a matter of luck that the person has a true belief.

Until the twenty-first century, there was nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Call this view “the incompatibility thesis.” In light of the incompatibility thesis, epistemic luck presents epistemologists with three distinct but related challenges. The first is that of providing an accurate analysis of knowledge (in terms of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for “S knows that p,” where ‘S’ represents the knower and ‘p’ represents the proposition known). An adequate analysis of knowledge must succeed in specifying conditions that rule out all instances of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. The second challenge is to resolve the skeptical paradox that the ubiquity of epistemic luck generates: As will become clear in section 2c, epistemic luck is an all-pervasive phenomenon. Coupling this fact with the incompatibility thesis entails that we have no propositional knowledge. The non-skeptical epistemologist must somehow reconcile the strong intuition that epistemic luck is not compatible with knowledge with the equally evident observation that it must be. The third challenge concerns the special skeptical threat that epistemic luck seems to pose for more reflective forms of knowledge, such as knowing that one knows. Each of these challenges will be explored in the present article.

Epistemic Luck and the Analysis of Knowledge
The Paradox of Epistemic Luck
Epistemic Luck and Knowing that One Knows
1. Internalism, Epistemic Luck, and the Problem of Knowing that One Knows
2. Epistemic Luck and Reflective Knowledge
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Epistemic Luck and the Analysis of Knowledge

There is no settled agreement as to how best to characterize the accidentality or fortuitousness of an epistemically lucky true belief. Some have attempted to cash out the accidentality of epistemically lucky beliefs modally. For example, Mark Heller (1999) contends that person S’s belief that p is epistemically lucky (and hence not knowledge) if p is true in the actual world, but there is at least one world, in a contextually-determined set of possible worlds, where S’s belief that p is false. On Duncan Pritchard’s modal characterization (2005), S’s belief is epistemically lucky if it is true in the actual world, but false in a majority of nearby possible worlds where S forms the belief in the same way. Others (Riggs 2007; Coffman 2007) insist that epistemic luck be cashed out in terms of a lack of control condition. Each of these proposals has been criticized in the literature. Despite the lack of agreement concerning the exact nature of epistemic luck, there is widespread agreement that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge.

One of the earliest recorded illustrations of knowledge-destroying luck can be found in Plato’s Theaetetus. In this dialogue, Socrates inquires as to what knowledge is. When Theaetetus suggests that knowledge is true belief, Socrates quickly convinces him that he is mistaken by noting that a jury may luckily arrive at a true belief either as a result of the rhetorical skill of a jurist intent on getting a certain verdict or on the basis of unsubstantiated hearsay, and in either case, the lucky true belief would fall short of knowledge. The Socratic challenge posed in the Theaetetus is to specify what must be added to true belief to get knowledge. To meet that challenge, one must provide an analysis of knowledge that correctly identifies the conditions that are individually necessary and jointly sufficient for S to know that p (where ‘S’ represents the knower and ‘p’ represents the proposition known). As will become readily apparent in what follows, the possibility of epistemic luck makes the already difficult task of meeting the Socratic challenge all the more difficult.

a. The Incompatibility Thesis

Epistemologists have long agreed with Plato that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge. To see just how widespread commitment to the incompatibility thesis is, consider the remarks of just few representative epistemologists. In The Problems of Philosophy (1912, p. 131), Bertrand Russell asks the question: “Can we ever know anything at all, or do we merely sometimes by good luck believe what is true?”—the implication being that lucky true belief is not knowledge. In Theory of Knowledge (1990, p. 12), Keith Lehrer stresses that knowledge requires more than lucky true acceptance: “If I accept something without evidence or justification . . . and, as luck would have it, this turns out to be right, I fall short of knowing that what I have accepted is true.” In Reasons and Knowledge (1981, p. 31), Marshall Swain maintains that: “lucky guesses do not constitute factual knowledge.” In his Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy article on the analysis of knowledge (2006), Matthias Steup expressly endorses the incompatibility thesis: “Let us refer to a belief’s turning out to be true because of mere luck as epistemic luck. It is uncontroversial that knowledge is incompatible with epistemic luck.” In his Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy article on epistemology (2007), David Truncellito concurs: “a lucky guess cannot constitute knowledge. Similarly, misinformation and faulty reasoning do not seem like a recipe for knowledge, even if they happen to lead to a true belief.” In Epistemic Luck (2005, p. 1), Duncan Pritchard calls attention to “the seemingly universal intuition that knowledge excludes luck, or, to put it another way, that the epistemic luck that sometimes enables one to have true beliefs . . . is incompatible with knowledge.”

The nearly universal intuition that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge is rooted in compelling examples like the following:

Jack of Hearts

Dylan is an avid euchre player. One night between hands, the dealer asks Dylan which card he believes to be on the top of the freshly shuffled euchre deck. Dylan thinks for a moment and, recalling his fondness of bowers, comes to believe that the top card is the jack of hearts. After Dylan reports his belief, the dealer turns over the top card, which just so happens to be the jack of hearts.

Since the probability of the jack of hearts being the top card of a randomly shuffled euchre deck is 1/32, it is just a matter of luck that Dylan’s belief was true. Dylan certainly didn’t know that the jack of hearts was the top card. He just happened to guess correctly, and knowledge requires more than lucky guesswork.

b. The Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge

Examples like Jack of Hearts clearly show that true belief is not sufficient for knowledge. What, then, must be added to true belief in order to get knowledge? Prior to 1963, most epistemologists maintained that justification is what is required to convert true belief to knowledge, and as a result, they endorsed the justified-true-belief analysis of knowledge:

(JTB) For any subject S and any proposition p, S knows that p if and only if:

(i) p is true,

(ii) S believes that p [Bp], and

(iii) S is justified in believing that p [Jp].

Fallibilists and infallibilists disagree about the kind of justification required by (iii). Infallibilists maintain that knowledge requires infallible justification. Infallible justification entails the truth of the proposition for which it is justification. Fallibilists, on the other hand, endorse a weaker justification requirement. They contend that the kind of justification requisite for knowledge need only render probable, but need not entail, that for which it is justification.

At first blush, it might look as if infallible justification holds the key to eliminating epistemic luck and is, thus, the kind of justification needed for knowledge. After all, if S believes that p on the basis of infallible truth-entailing justification for p, it is impossible for S to be mistaken with respect to p. Unfortunately, the legacy of infallibilism is nearly wholesale skepticism. The point can be demonstrated as follows: Since our evidence for the non-cogito contingent empirical propositions we believe never entails the truth of those propositions, it follows that if the kind of justification required for knowledge is infallible truth-entailing justification, then we are never justified in believing, and hence never know, that such propositions are true. An infallibilist justification requirement would go a long way toward eliminating epistemic luck, but it would do so at the cost of making empirical knowledge impossible—hardly an adequate non-skeptical solution to the problem of epistemic luck.

Recognizing the skeptical implications of infallibilism, most contemporary epistemologists have embraced fallibilism so that empirical knowledge remains at least in principle possible. Fallibilistic justification is thought to rule out epistemic luck by making one’s belief extremely probable. When one’s belief that p is extremely probable, it is not just a matter of luck that one’s belief is true. Recall Jack of Hearts. Prior to the dealer’s turning over the top card, Dylan has no evidence as to what the top card is. As such, it is extremely improbable that the top card is the jack of hearts. Consider how Dylan’s epistemic situation changes after the dealer turns over the top card, and Dylan sees the jack of hearts. Now Dylan has good perceptual evidence that the card is the jack of hearts. Given his newly-acquired perceptual evidence, it is now extremely probable that the card is the jack of hearts, and as a result, it is no longer just a matter of luck that his belief that it is the jack of hearts is true. Granted, it is possible that a Cartesian evil demon could have caused Dylan to hallucinate the jack of hearts right as the dealer flipped over some other card (which illustrates that Dylan’s perceptual evidence doesn’t entail that the card is the jack of hearts), and so, his evidence doesn’t eliminate all chance of error; but it does make the chance of error extremely low, and when error is extremely improbable, it is not simply a matter of luck that one’s belief is true.

c. The Gettier Problem

Although the role of the justification condition in the JTB-analysis is to rule out lucky guesses as instances of knowledge, it remains possible, given any fallibilistic account of justification, to have a justified belief that is only luckily true, a fact that went largely unnoticed until the publication of Edmund Gettier’s seminal article “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” (1963). Therein, Gettier provides two compelling counterexamples to the JTB-analysis of knowledge. He dubs these examples “Case I” and “Case II.” Both cases involve a person who justifiably comes to believe a true proposition by validly deducing it from a justified-but-false belief. Consider first Gettier’s Case II.

Case II: Smith has good evidence for believing that Jones owns a Ford [J]. Indeed, Smith’s evidence for thinking that Jones owns a Ford is at least as strong as the evidence that we typically have for thinking that our friends and family members own the cars they do. Smith’s evidence consists of the following: As far back as Smith can remember, Jones has always owned a Ford; just that morning, Jones gave Smith a ride while driving a Ford; and Smith was with Jones a few months back when Jones purchased a Ford exactly like the one she was driving when she offered Smith the ride earlier that morning. Based on this evidence, Smith justifiedly believes that Jones owns a Ford [J]. On the basis of her justified belief that J, Smith justifiedly deduces and comes to believe the disjunction that either Jones owns a Ford or Brown is in Barcelona [J or B], despite having no idea of Brown’s whereabouts. As it turns out, Jones no longer owns a Ford. She recently sold her Ford and is driving a rental. However, purely by coincidence, Brown happens to be in Barcelona. Obviously, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s justified belief that J or B is true. Nearly every epistemologist who has considered this case agrees that Smith’s luck-infused justified-true-belief that J or B falls short of knowledge.

Here is a slightly modified version Gettier’s other example. Case I: While waiting for a job interview, Smith sees Nelson take the coins out of her pocket, count them (ten coins in all), and then put them back in her pocket. Smith also overhears the boss on the phone telling someone that Nelson is the person who will get the job. On the basis of this evidence, Smith justifiedly believes the conjunction:

(N) Nelson will get the job, and Nelson has ten coins in her pocket.

On basis of her justified belief that N, Smith deduces and justifiedly comes to believe:

(P) The person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket.

Despite Smith’s evidence, N is false. The boss misspoke on the phone. Actually, it is Smith, not Nelson, who will get the job, and purely by chance, Smith happens to have exactly ten coins in her pocket. Once again, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s belief—this time her belief that P—is true. With these two examples, Gettier showed that fallibilistic justification is incapable of eliminating all forms of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck and that, as a result, justified true belief is not sufficient for knowledge.

d. Purported Solutions to the Gettier Problem

Gettier’s paper gave rise to a plethora of articles attempting to solve the problem that now bears his name. Many of these purported solutions sought to resolve the problem by supplementing the JTB-analysis with a fourth condition, while others abandoned the JTB-analysis in favor of non-traditional ajustificational accounts of knowledge. Consider first some of the prominent fourth condition responses.

i. No False Grounds

In both of Gettier’s examples, Smith justifiably infers a true belief from a justified-but-false belief, and it has seemed to many that a true belief is not knowledge when it is deduced from a false belief. As a result, a number of epistemologists sought to resolve the Gettier problem by supplementing JTB with a “No False Grounds” clause along the following lines:

(NFG) S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) S’s justification for p does not rest on any false beliefs.

An analysis of knowledge can be too strong or too weak: It is too strong if it is possible for a person to know that p without satisfying all of the conditions spelled out in the analysis. It is too weak if one can fail to know that p when all the conditions in the analysis have been met. To see that NFG is too strong, we need only modify Gettier’s Case II as follows:

Café

Smith is sitting in a café in Barcelona with Brown having a cup of espresso. While there, with Brown, Smith justifiably infers and comes to believe that J or B on the basis of her justified-but-false belief that Jones owns a Ford [J] and on the basis of her justified-true-belief that Brown is Barcelona [B].

In this scenario, Smith has excellent evidence for B along with her misleading evidence for J. Since Smith knows B is true and validly deduces J or B from her knowledge that B, it is not at all lucky that her justified belief that J or B is true; and so, Smith knows that J or B, despite the fact that part of her evidence, namely, J, is false. Hence, NFG is false, for it entails that a person fails to know that p whenever any part (even a dispensable and thus superfluous part) of her justification is false, when, intuitively, a person with some false evidence for p can still know that p provided she has at least one independent chain of all-true-evidence justification for p.

ii. No Essential False Grounds

In Gettier’s Case II (where Smith clearly fails to know that J or B), Smith’s justification for J or B essentially depends on Smith’s justified-but-false belief that J. In Café (where intuitively Smith does know that J or B), Smith has two independent strands of justification for J or B. The first strand is her justified-but-false belief that J. The second strand is her justified-true-belief that B. As a result, Smith could dispense with the first strand entirely and still be justified in believing the disjunction J or B. Our markedly different appraisals of Smith’s epistemic status vis-à-vis J or B in these two cases suggest that the presence of false grounds precludes the knowledge that p only when those grounds play an indispensable role in a person’s justification for p. Given this insight, it might seem that the no false grounds condition in NFG should be replaced with a no essential false grounds condition as follows:

(NEFG) S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) S’s justification for p does not essentially depend on any false beliefs.

Unfortunately, NEFG is too weak because there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases—cases where the person’s justification for her lucky true belief does not depend on any false beliefs. An example of an all-true-evidence Gettier case is provided by Brian Skyrms’s (1967) case involving Sure-Fire matches:

Pyromaniac

Pete knows that Sure-Fire matches have always lit in the past when struck. Pete also knows that the match he is holding is a Sure-Fire match. Based on this evidence, which he knows to be true, Pete justifiably believes that the match he is holding will light when struck [L]. Unbeknownst to Pete, the match he is holding is a defective Sure-Fire match (the first ever!) with impurities that raise its combustion temperature above that which can be produced by striking friction. As luck would have it, just as Pete strikes the match, a sudden burst of Q-radiation ignites the match.

In Pyromaniac, Pete has a justified true belief that L, which is based entirely on true evidence that Pete knows, and yet, it is still just a matter of luck that his belief is true. This example shows that one can have a lucky true belief that p that falls short of knowledge, even when all of one’s evidence for p is true. Thus, NEFG is too weak. There are genuine Gettier cases that it fails to rule out.

iii. Defeasibility Approaches

In each of Gettier’s original cases, there is a true proposition unbeknownst to Smith such that were that proposition added to the rest of Smith’s evidence, Smith would no longer be justified in believing the Gettiered belief. Call such a proposition a defeater. In Case I, the defeater is the true proposition that Nelson will not get the job [~N]. If ~N were added to Smith’s evidence, Smith would not be justified in believing that the person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket, for she would no longer have any idea who will get the job. In Case II, the defeater is the true proposition that Jones does not own a Ford [~J]. Since Smith has no knowledge as to Brown’s whereabouts, if ~J were added to Smith’s evidence, she would no longer be justified in believing that J or B. Notice, however, that in the case of Café (where Smith is with Brown in Barcelona), the true proposition ~J is not a defeater, because adding ~J to Smith’s evidence in Café would not prevent Smith from being justified in believing that J or B. Smith would still be justified in believing J or B on the basis of her justified true belief that B.

Defeasibility theorists contend that a person fails to know that p whenever there is a defeater for her justification for p. Their proposal for solving the Gettier problem is to supplement the JTB-analysis with a No Defeaters condition as follows:

(ND) S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) there are no defeaters for S’s justification for p.

The biggest problem facing the No Defeaters approach is that there is no agreement among defeasibility theorists themselves as to the correct account of defeaters. For example, Roderick Chisholm (1964) and Peter Klein (1971) have characterized defeaters as follows:

(D1) When evidence e justifies S in believing that p, then proposition d is a defeater for S’s justification if and only if (i) d is true and (ii) the conjunction of d and e does not justify S in believing that p.

Keith Lehrer and Thomas Paxson Jr. (1969) contend that D1 is too weak, as a definition of defeaters, because it counts as defeaters certain statements that intuitively are not defeaters. They offer the following case in point:

Grabit

While at the library, I see a student of mine, Tom Grabit, take a book from the shelf, conceal it under his coat, and leave the library without checking it out. I know Tom Grabit well, and I am sure that he stole the book. I justifiedly believe that Tom Grabit stole the book, and he did.

Intuitively, I know that Tom Grabit stole the book. But here’s the rub: Unbeknownst to me, Tom Grabit’s mother said that on the day in question Tom was not in the library, indeed, he was thousands of miles away, and that Tom’s identical twin, John Grabit, was in the library. On the D1 account of defeaters, the following true proposition is a defeater for my justification for thinking that Tom stole the book:

(M) Tom’s mother said that Tom was not in the library at the time of the theft, but his identical twin John was.

If M were added to my evidence, I would no longer be justified in believing that Tom stole the book. This result might seem like the right result until we discover that Tom’s mother is both delusional and a pathological liar, that she said these things to herself in her padded cell, that John Grabit is a figment of her demented mind, and that Tom stole the book just as I thought. Lehrer and Paxson argue that the fact that it is true that a delusional mental patient uttered false statements about Tom Grabit’s location on the day of the theft should not defeat my knowledge that Tom Stole the book. They conclude that the Chisholm/Klein account of defeaters should be replaced with the follow account:

(D2) When evidence e justifies S in believing that p, then proposition d is a defeater for S’s justification if and only if (i) d is true, (ii) S is completely justified in believing that d is false, and (iii) the conjunction of d and e does not justify S in believing that p.

In Grabit, I do not have any evidence concerning what Tom’s mother said or didn’t say, and so, I am not completely justified in believing that it is false that she said those things. As a result, condition (ii) of D2 is not satisfied, and so, on the Lehrer/Paxson account of defeaters that fact that Ms. Grabit said those things is not a defeater for my evidence that Tom stole the book. Consequently, on the D2-account of defeaters, I have an undefeated justified true belief that Tom stole the book and thus know that Tom stole the book, which is the intuitively correct result.

The Chisholm/Klein D1-account of defeaters gets the Grabit case wrong, for it entails that the true statement M defeats my justification for thinking that Tom stole the book. Since M is a defeater on the Chisholm/Klein account, their account entails that I do not know that Tom stole the book; when, intuitively, I do know that Tom stole the book. I saw him steal it, and the insane ramblings of his demented mother do nothing to undermine my knowledge.

Now consider a different case:

Locked

John Lock is compulsive when it comes to locking his doors. This morning when he left for work, he locked the front door and tripled checked that the door was locked. It is now 11:00 a.m., and John is sitting in his office recalling his morning ritual. He clearly and distinctly remembers locking his front door and triple checking to make sure that it was in fact locked. On the basis of this vivid memorial evidence e, he comes to believe that his front door is locked. Lucy Lock, John’s wife, is notoriously unreliable about locking the doors when she leaves home, which is why John always insists on leaving home after Lucy leaves for work. Unbeknownst to John, Lucy forgot her workout clothes and returned home at 10:30 a.m. to retrieve them, and she just happened to lock the door when she left five minutes later.

So, at 11:00 a.m., John’s belief that the front door is locked is true. Presumably, John does not know that the front door is locked. He thinks the door is locked because he remembers locking it, but that is not why it is locked. It is locked because Lucy absentmindedly and uncharacteristically happened to lock it on her way out. Intuitively, John’s knowledge is defeated by the following true proposition:

(U) The door was unlocked by Lucy at 10:30 a.m.

If U were added to John’s memorial evidence e, John would no longer be justified in believing that his front door is locked. On the Chisholm/Klein D1-account of defeaters, U is a defeater because U is true and the conjunction of U and e would not justify John in believing that his front door is locked. However, on the Lehrer/Paxson D2-account of defeaters, U would not count as a defeater because sitting in his office at 11:00 a.m., John has no evidence concerning whether or not his wife returned home to retrieve her gym clothes, and so, he is not completely justified in believing it false that the door was unlocked by Lucy Lock at 10:30 a.m. Since U is not a defeater on the Lehrer/Paxson account, their account entails that John knows that his front door is locked; when, intuitively, he fails to know that his door is locked, because it is just a matter of luck that Lucy absentmindedly locked it when she left.

The problem for the No Defeaters approach, then, is this: D1 is too weak of an account of defeaters, and as a result, employing a D1-account of defeaters in ND would make ND too strong an account of knowledge; whereas D2 is too strong an account of defeaters, and so, employing it in ND would make ND too weak. Absent an adequate account of defeaters, the No Defeaters approach fails to provide a solution to the problem of epistemic luck.

iv. The Externalist Turn

Externalist theories of justification maintain that epistemic justification is (at least) partly a function of features external to the cognizer, that is, features outside the cognizer’s ken. For example, one prominent externalist theory, process reliabilism, makes a belief’s justificatory status a function of the actual reliability (rather than the perceived reliability) of the process producing that belief. One motivation behind externalism with respect to justification is its unique ability to provide a truth connection that conceptually links justification with truth. To appreciate the importance of this motivation, recall that the role of the justification condition in the JTB-analysis is to rule out lucky guesses as instances of knowledge. In order for justification to be able to properly play that role, there must be some sort of internal connection between justification and truth that makes the former objectively indicative of the latter. Indeed, many epistemologists insist that it is precisely its internal connection to truth that distinguishes epistemic justification from moral and pragmatic justification. To be objectively indicative of truth, justification must be conceptually connected (not merely coincidentally or contingently connected) with truth. In order for there to be a conceptual connection between justification and truth, the following condition must hold: In every possible world W, if conditions C make belief b justified in W, then conditions C also make b objectively probable in W. The rationale for requiring such a truth connection is this: If there were no conceptual connection between justification and truth, it would be just as much a matter of luck when a justified belief turned out to be true as when an unjustified belief turned out to be true. Moreover, a better justified belief would be no more likely to be true than a much less well justified belief, for without a truth connection, no amount of justification is an objective indication of truth.

Unlike externalist theories of justification, no internalist theory of justification can provide the desired conceptual connection between justification and truth. Internalist theories maintain that epistemic justification is solely a function of states internal to the cognizer, such as perceptual states, belief states, memorial seemings, and introspective states. Examples of such theories include classical foundationalism, coherentism, and evidentialism. That no internalist theory of justification can provide a truth connection can be demonstrated as follows: Every internalist theory of justification maintains that the conditions that make a belief justified are entirely specifiable in terms of states internal to the cognizer, and for any set of entirely internally specifiable justification-conferring conditions, C_I, there will always be a possible world, W_D, where a Cartesian evil demon has seen to it that S possesses the requisite internal states and, hence, satisfies C_I, even though all of S’s contingent empirical beliefs are false. Since the conditions C_I that make S’s belief b internalistically justified in W_D do not make b objectively probable in W_D, no internalist theory is capable of providing a truth connection. Because internalistic justification is not conceptually connected to truth, one can easily be internalistically justified in holding a false belief, which can in turn be used to justifiably infer some other belief that may coincidentally turn out to be true. Consequently, employing an internalistic justification condition in the JTB-analysis makes JTB particularly susceptible to Gettier cases.

At first glance, externalistic justification looks more promising as a means of preventing luck from playing a role in the acquisition of true belief, for some externalist theories of justification do provide a conceptual connection between justification and truth. Consider, for example, the following simplified version of process reliabilism:

(PR) S’s belief b is justified in world W if and only if S’s belief b is produced by a belief-forming cognitive process [BCP] that is W-reliable (where a W-reliable BCP is a process that tends to produce beliefs in W that are true in W).

Since PR asserts that a belief is justified in W if and only if it is produced by a W-reliable BCP, and since, by definition, the beliefs produced by a W-reliable process tend to be true in W, PR-justified beliefs have a high objective probability of being true. Because reliably-produced, externalistically-justified beliefs are objectively likely to be true, one might think that replacing the internalistic justification condition in the traditional JTB-analysis with an externalistic justification condition would render JTB immune to Gettier-style counterexamples. William Harper (1996) quickly dispels any such notion, with the following counterexample:

Falcon

Smith believes that Jones owns a Ford. Smith was with Jones when Jones purchased her Pinto; Smith has seen the official title to the car in Jones’s name; Jones is a reliable informant that has never deceived anyone; and just this morning, Jones gave Smith a ride to work in her Pinto. Smith has a reliably-produced and reliably-sustained belief that Jones owns a Ford. It is now 1:00 p.m. Unbeknownst to Smith, at noon Jones’s Pinto was vaporized by a terrorist bomb; but, also unbeknownst to Smith, exactly at noon Jones won a Ford Falcon in the State Lottery. Hence, Smith has a reliably-formed true belief that Jones owns a Ford, but her belief is not knowledge.

While internalistic justification may be particularly susceptible to being undermined by Gettier-style knowledge-destroying luck, Harper’s counterexample shows that the Gettier problem plagues all fallibilistic theories of justification, both internalistic and externalistic alike. Whatever virtues externalistic justification might have, solving the Gettier problem is not among them.

v. The Causal Theory of Knowing

In his early work, Alvin Goldman (1967) offers a different diagnosis of what has gone wrong in Gettier cases. In Case II, what makes J or B true is the fact that Brown is in Barcelona, but this fact plays no causal role in Smith’s coming to believe that J or B. In Case I, what makes P (P = the person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket) true is the number of coins in Smith’s pocket, but this fact plays no role in Smith’s coming to believe P. What causes Smith to believe P is the fact that Nelson has ten coins in her pocket, and this latter fact is not what makes P true. Goldman observes that in these cases there is no causal connection between the Gettiered belief and the fact that makes it true. It is the absence of such a connection that allows for the possibility of belief’s being true purely by luck. Goldman concludes that the traditional JTB-analysis should be replaced with the following causal theory of knowledge:

(CTOK) S knows that p if and only if the fact that p is causally connected in an appropriate way with S’s believing that p.

The appropriate knowledge-producing causal processes that Goldman identifies include: (i) perception, (ii) memory, (iii) inferentially reconstructed causal chains, each inference of which is warranted, and (iv) combinations of (i)-(iii). The causal theory correctly handles all of the cases we have considered so far. We have already seen how it handles Gettier’s original cases. In Café, what makes J or B true is the fact that Brown is in Barcelona, and that fact is appropriately causally connected with Smith’s believing that J or B, because Smith is having an espresso with Brown in Barcelona. Accordingly, CTOK correctly entails that, in Café, Smith knows that J or B. In Grabit, I see Tom steal the book. Tom’s stealing the book in plain eyesight perceptually causes me to believe that he did, and so, once again, CTOK yields the right result: I know that Tom Grabit stole the book. In Locked, what makes it true that the front door is locked is the fact that Lucy locked it, and this fact plays no causal role in John’s believing his front door is locked. In this case, CTOK correctly entails that John does not know that his front door is locked. He’s just lucky that Lucy happened to lock it. Finally, in Falcon, what makes it true that Jones owns a Ford is the fact that she just won a Ford Falcon in the state lottery, and that fact plays no causal role in Smith’s believing that Jones owns a Ford, and so, Smith fails to know that Jones owns a Ford.

Despite its success in handling these cases, the causal theory falls prey to the following counterexample:

Fake Barn County

An eccentric farmer in Minnesota owns all of the land in Fake Barn County. Wanting to appear much richer than he is, this farmer has erected fake barns all throughout the county. From the road, these fake barns look exactly like real barns, when, in reality, they are just two dimensional barn façades. While nearly every barn-looking structure in the county is a fake, there are a few real barns interspersed among the myriad fakes. Henry, who is driving through Fake Barn County, has no idea that there are any fake barns in the county. Looking out the window of his car, Henry sees what looks to be a barn on the hill just up the road and comes to believe that there is a barn on the hill. Purely by chance, Henry happens to be looking at one of the few real barns in the county.

Intuitively, Henry does not know that there is a barn on the hill. He is just lucky to be looking at one of the few real barns in the county. The lucky nature of his present belief becomes even more obvious once we discover that Henry has been forming barn beliefs ever since entering Fake Barn County, and all of these other barn beliefs have been false. Henry has consistently been duped by the façades.

The causal theory fails because it cannot account for Henry’s lack of knowledge in this case. Henry is now looking at one of the few real barns in the county, and this real barn is what is causing him to believe that there is a barn on the hill. Since Henry’s true belief that there is a barn on that hill is appropriately caused via perception by that very barn on that hill, the causal theory mistakenly entails that Henry knows there is a barn on that hill, when clearly he does not.

e. Controversial Cases

As analyses of knowledge aimed as at solving the Gettier problem have grown in sophistication and complexity, so have the purported counterexamples aimed at refuting these analyses. Some of these purported counterexamples are sufficiently complex and controversial that there is no consensus among epistemologists as to whether or not the person in the example knows the proposition in question. Two such cases are discussed below.

i. Beneficial Falsehoods

Although the no essential false grounds approach was largely abandoned once it was shown that there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases—cases where S’s justification for her lucky belief p does not depend on any false beliefs—there has remained nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that a person fails to know that p if her justification for p essentially depends on a false belief. Peter Klein (2008) is a noteworthy exception. He contends that there can be beneficial falsehoods—falsehoods essential to one’s justification that nevertheless give one knowledge. Here is one example that Klein offers in support of his controversial view:

Appointment

Based on memory, I believe that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment with a student on Monday. Based on that justified-but-false memorial belief, I come to justifiedly believe that I have an appointment on Monday. As it turns out, I do have that appointment on Monday, and my secretary did tell me of the appointment. However, he didn’t tell me on Friday. He told me on Thursday.

Klein contends that I know that I have an appointment on Monday [A], even though my belief that A essentially depends on my false belief that my secretary told me on Friday about my Monday appointment. It might seem that the false belief that my secretary told me on Friday that I have a Monday appointment is not essential to my justification for A, because if I “remember” that my secretary told me on Friday of my Monday appointment, then presumably I also actually remember that my secretary told me I have an appointment on Monday, and this latter belief is true. But suppose that the secretary was out with the flu the first three days of the week, and also suppose that I do not remember being on campus on Thursday. In fact, I’m confident that I wasn’t on campus on Thursday, having totally forgotten that I briefly stopped in on Thursday to get my mail. Klein contends that in such a situation I would not believe that my secretary told me of the appointment at all, unless I believed that he told me this on Friday. Klein contends that I know that A, even though that belief essentially depends on my false belief that my secretary told me on Friday about my Monday appointment.

What distinguishes beneficial falsehoods from knowledge-destroying falsehoods? Under what circumstances does a false belief f allow S to acquire knowledge that p? Klein’s answers to these questions are rooted in and flow out of his preferred theory of knowledge. Klein contends that knowledge requires both propositional and doxastic justification. Proposition p is propositionally justified for S if and only if S has an epistemically adequate basis for p. S’s belief that p is doxastically justified for S if and only if S’s belief that p has an appropriate causal basis. The basic idea is that in order for S to know that p, S’s belief that p must be epistemically justified and appropriately caused. Armed with the distinction between propositional and doxastic justification, Klein argues that a false belief f is a beneficial falsehood just in case the following seven conditions are met: (i) f is false, (ii) S’s belief that f is doxastically justified (that is, S’s belief that f has an appropriate causal pedigree), (iii) the belief that f is essential in the causal production of the belief that p, (iv) f propositionally justifies p, (v) f entails a true proposition t, (vi) t propositionally justifies p, and (vii) whatever doxastically justifies S in believing that f also propositionally justifies t for S. When these conditions are met, Klein contends that the false belief f is “close enough to the truth” to give one knowledge that p. Applied to the case at hand, F is the false proposition that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment on Monday, and T is the true proposition that my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday. Klein contends that my belief that F meets all the conditions for being a beneficial falsehood: (i) F is false, (ii) my belief that F is doxastically justified (appropriately caused) by the fact that he did tell me, (iii) my belief that F is essential to my believing that A (for if I didn’t believe F, I would not believe he had told me about an appointment at all and so I would not believe A), (iv) F propositionally justifies A, (v) F entails the true proposition T, (vi) T propositionally justifies A, and (vii) the fact that my secretary told me on Thursday about my Monday appointment propositionally justifies T for me.

Klein contends that, in the case at hand, it doesn’t really matter what day my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday. What matters is the fact that he told me. The false belief that he told me on Friday is close enough to the true proposition that he told me as to give me knowledge that I have an appointment on Monday.

While interesting and provocative, Klein’s case is difficult to assess because it depends on controversial assumptions about belief individuation. Is it possible, for example, to believe that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment on Monday [F], without also believing that my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday [T]? If not, then rather than providing us with a case of an indispensable knowledge-generating false belief, Klein may have simply given us another case of justificatory over-determination; for if it is impossible to believe F without also believing T, then there seem to be two independent strands of justification only one of which depends on a false belief, in which case Appointment is simply an analogue of Café above.

ii. Misleading Evidence One Does Not Possess

Gilbert Harman (1973) contends that S’s knowledge that p can be undermined by readily available misleading evidence that S does not possess. In Harman cases, despite the fact that the undermining evidence is misleading, if S were to possess it, S would no longer be justified in believing that p. The idea behind Harman cases seems to be this: Since the misleading evidence is readily available, it is just a matter of luck that S does not possess that evidence, and since luck is incompatible with knowledge, S fails to know that p. Here is one of Harman’s cases:

Assassination

A political leader is assassinated. His associates, fearing a coup, decide to pretend that the bullet hit someone else. On Nationwide television they announce that an assassination attempt has failed to kill the leader but has killed a secret service man by mistake. However, before the announcement is made, an enterprising reporter on the scene telephones the real story to his newspaper, which has included the story in its final edition. Jill buys a copy of that paper, reads the story of the assassination, and believes that the President has been assassinated based on the story. What she reads is true, and so are her assumptions about how the story came to be in the paper. (1973, 143)

Harman insists that Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated. He finds it highly implausible that Jill should know simply because she lacks evidence that everyone else possesses. Harman’s diagnosis is that Jill’s knowledge is undermined by readily available evidence – the misleading televised retraction – that she does not possess.

Epistemologists who have reflected on Harman’s Assassination case remain divided over whether or not Jill knows that the President has been assassinated. Those who think that she does know that the President has been assassinated tend to focus on the facts that (i) all of her evidence is true, (ii) she knows her evidence is true, and (iii) the evidence she has is an accurate indicator of the President’s assassination.

Those epistemologists who think that Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated do not focus on the quality of Jill’s evidence, which is impeccable. Rather, they focus on the lucky nature of her evidence. If Jill had turned on the TV when she got home, like she usually does, she would have seen the televised retraction, and she would have found herself in the same epistemic predicament as everyone else. Given the conflicting reports, she would not have known what to believe. Clearly, Jill is lucky to be in the evidential situation she is in. Since luck is generally thought to be incompatible with knowledge, these epistemologists conclude that Jill fails to know that the President has been assassinated.

iii. Impact of These Cases

Controversial cases like these make the challenge of providing an accurate analysis of knowledge even more difficult. If Jill does know that the President has been assassinated, then all those theories of knowledge that imply that she lacks such knowledge (including Harman’s own theory) are mistaken. On the other hand, if Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated, then all those theories that imply she does are mistaken. Similarly, if I do not know that I have an appointment on Monday, then all those theories that imply I do (including Klein’s theory) are mistaken. If I do know that I have an appointment on Monday, then all those theories that imply I lack such knowledge are mistaken. The competing intuitions these cases engender make the already difficult task of arriving at a mutually agreed upon account of knowledge even more formidable.

f. Where Things Stand

While various proponents of the above proposals might still embrace them, the general consensus is that none of the above attempts at eliminating epistemic luck succeeds. One problem with these first attempts at resolving the Gettier problem is that they tended to emerge in a piecemeal fashion as responses to specific counterexamples, only to fall prey to more elaborate counterexamples themselves. What seems to be needed is a better understanding of epistemic luck itself. If we can get clear on the exact nature of knowledge-destroying luck, we might be in a better position to formulate a condition that can eliminate it. The next section will examine a number of attempts at clarifying the nature of knowledge-destroying luck and will assess several modal conditions that have been proposed to eliminate such luck.

2. The Paradox of Epistemic Luck

In addition to generating problems for those epistemologists seeking an analysis of knowledge, the phenomenon of epistemic luck gives rise to an epistemological paradox in its own right. The paradox is generated by the following three theses: the knowledge thesis, the incompatibility thesis, and the ubiquity thesis. The paradox arises because each of these theses is antecedently plausible, but together they form an inconsistent triad. Each thesis is discussed below.

a. The Knowledge Thesis

According to the knowledge thesis, we possess a great deal of knowledge about the world around us. Commonsense tells us that the knowledge thesis is true. For example, I know that I am in a coffee shop. I know that I am drinking a cup of coffee. I know that I am wearing a blue shirt. I know that I am typing on a laptop computer. And I know that the person sitting next to me is talking on his cell phone at an inappropriate volume. You know that you have eyes. You know that you are reading an IEP article on epistemic luck. You know that the article you are reading is written in English. Together, we know a lot. At least, we think we do, until we encounter a skeptical paradox like the paradox of epistemic luck.

b. The Incompatibility Thesis (Again)

The incompatibility thesis is the thesis that epistemic luck simpliciter is incompatible with knowledge. As noted above, there has been nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that knowledge is incompatible with epistemic luck. The post-Gettier literature is replete with evermore-sophisticated counterexamples to the array of purported accounts of knowledge proffered in an effort to resolve the Gettier problem. The standard formula for generating a counterexample to a purported analysis of knowledge is to conjure up a case where, despite satisfying all the conditions in the analysis, it is still just a matter of luck that the person’s belief that p is true. The element of luck involved is ipso facto thought to prevent the belief from being an instance of knowledge. The nearly unanimous acceptance of such examples illustrates just how widespread commitment to the incompatibility thesis is.

c. The Ubiquity Thesis

Epistemic luck is an all-pervasive phenomenon that infects every fallibilistic epistemology in one form or other. Its inescapability can be demonstrated as follows: To convert true belief to knowledge, every viable fallibilistic epistemology requires satisfying either some internalistic justification condition or some externalistic condition (that may or may not be a justification condition). But neither an internalistic nor an externalistic condition can completely succeed in eliminating epistemic luck. A little recognized consequence of the new evil demon problem is that internalistic justification is not conceptually connected to truth in any robust way, for demon-world victims have internalistically justified beliefs almost all of which are false. Given the absence of a robust truth connection, it is always in some sense a matter of luck when a merely internalistically justified belief turns out to be true. To see why, consider my twin in an evil demon world W_D. By hypothesis, he has the same beliefs that I have, he has the same memorial seemings that I have, he possesses the same experiential evidence that I possess, and he goes through exactly the same internal reflections that I do. In short, our internal cognitive lives are phenomenologically, doxastically, and reflectively indistinguishable. Consequently, if I satisfy the internal conditions for justifiedness (whatever they may be), then my demon-world twin satisfies them as well, and so, we are both internalistically justified in our beliefs. If, on the other hand, I fail to satisfy those conditions, then my twin also fails to satisfy them, and so neither of us is internalistically justified in our beliefs. Now assume the former scenario where both of us are internalistically justified in our beliefs. The only relevant difference between my twin and me is that he is being systematically deceived, whereas, as epistemic good fortune would have it, I am not. If he and I were to change places, there would be no introspectable difference, and each of us would continue to believe as we do, only now I would be the hapless victim of demon deception. Clearly, I am epistemically fortunate to be in the world I am in (assuming I am in the world I take myself to be in) and not in W_D. Since I am lucky to be in the world I am in, there is a clear sense in which it is epistemically lucky that my internalistically justified beliefs are true. My twin is not nearly so lucky, for, thanks to the demon, all of his internalistically justified beliefs are false. Since these results can be generated no matter which internalistic theory of justification one employs, it is always a matter of luck when a merely internalistically justified belief happens to be true.

Truth-connected externalist approaches (for example, reliabilist, truth-tracking, and safety-based accounts) avoid this kind of epistemic luck. However, they are subject to another kind of ineliminable epistemic luck. Recall, from section 1, the externalistic process-reliabilist account of epistemic justification:

(PR) S’s belief b is justified in world W if and only if S’s belief b is produced by a belief-forming cognitive process that is W-reliable.

Call a belief that is justified in virtue of being reliably produced a PR-justified belief. Although it is not typically a matter of luck when a PR-justified belief turns out to be true (since PR-justification is conceptually connected to truth), it is a matter of luck when a belief turns out to be PR-justified. To see why, consider, once again, my twin in the demon world W_D. By hypothesis, he and I share the same beliefs, possess the same evidence, go through the same internal reflections, and have phenomenologically, doxastically, and reflectively indistinguishable cognitive lives. Even so, our beliefs do not have the same PR-justificatory status. His beliefs are not PR-justified, because they are produced by processes that the demon has rendered unreliable in W_D, whereas my beliefs are PR-justified because they are produced by processes that are reliable in the actual world (Again, I’m assuming, for the sake of the example, that the actual world is the world we think it is.). According to PR, it is not a matter of luck that my beliefs are true and his beliefs are false, because my beliefs are PR-justified and his are not, and PR-justified beliefs have a high objective probability of being true. What is a matter of luck is the fact that my beliefs are PR-justified and his are not. After all, we both take ourselves to be in non-demon-manipulated worlds, and we both take ourselves to have reliably-produced PR-justified beliefs. As luck and ill luck, respectively, would have it, I am correct and he is incorrect. Since there is no introspectively discernible difference between our worlds, given what each of us has to go on, there is a clear sense in which I could have just as easily been mistaken and been the one with demon-rendered-unreliable processes. Compared to my twin, I am epistemically fortunate to be in a non-demon world where my cognitive faculties are reliable. Since I am epistemically lucky (compared with my twin) to be in a world where I have reliable cognitive processes, there is clearly a sense in which it is just a matter of luck that I have PR-justified beliefs.

Analogous considerations can be applied to any externalistic constraint on knowledge. Consider the externalistic condition of being a safe belief (to be explained below). While a safe belief’s being true is not epistemically lucky, having safe beliefs is epistemically lucky, for in a demon world none of one’s beliefs are safe. Since every fallibilistic epistemology incorporates either an internalistic justification condition or an externalistic condition, no fallibilistic epistemology can rid us of epistemic luck’s intractable presence.

d. The Skeptical Challenge

Epistemic luck, then, is ubiquitous and unavoidable. If all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge, as the incompatibility thesis maintains, skepticism is correct and the knowledge thesis is false. And yet, we remain convinced that we possess lots of knowledge. The task facing the anti-skeptical epistemologist is to reconcile the rather strong intuition that epistemic luck is not compatible with knowledge with the equally evident observation that it must be. Since the ubiquity thesis is unassailable, the anti-skeptical epistemologist must reject the incompatibility thesis.

e. Rejecting the Incompatibility Thesis

Peter Unger (1968) was the first epistemologist to note that not all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge. He identified the following three types of benign epistemic luck: (1) Propositional luck: It can be entirely accidental that p is true, and S can still know that p. For example, a person who witnesses an automobile accident can certainly know that the accident occurred. (2) Existential luck: For S to know that p, S must exist, and it might be extraordinarily lucky that S exists. If S is the lone survivor of a fiery plane crash, S is lucky to be alive, but S’s existential luck does not preclude her from knowing that she survived the crash. (3) Facultative luck: To know that p, S must possess the cognitive skills requisite for knowledge. Suppose S is shot in the head but the bullet narrowly misses all vital regions of the brain required for conceptual thought and knowledge. S is overwhelmingly lucky that she still possesses the cognitive capacities needed for knowledge, but since she does possess them, she is still capable of knowing many things, including that she was shot in the head.

f. Knowledge-Destroying Epistemic Luck

Unger has successfully identified three types of harmless epistemic luck, but not all forms of epistemic luck are benign. What is needed is an account of knowledge-undermining luck.

i. Evidential vs. Veritic Luck

Mylan Engel Jr. (1992) distinguishes two kinds of epistemic luck, evidential luck and veritic luck, and argues that only the latter is incompatible with knowledge. Engel characterizes these two types of luck as follows:

(EL) A person S is evidentially lucky in believing that p in circumstances C if and only if it is just a matter of luck that S has the evidence e for p that she does, but given her evidence e, it is not a matter of luck that her belief that p is true in C.

(VL) A person S is veritically lucky in believing that p in circumstances C if and only if, given S’s evidence for p, it is just a matter of luck that S’s belief that p is true in C.

To see that evidential luck is compatible with knowledge, suppose that a bank robber’s mask slips momentarily during a holdup and the startled teller sees clearly that the robber is the bank president. In such a situation, the teller would clearly be lucky to have the evidence she does, but she would nevertheless know that the bank president is the villain.

Engel argues that all genuine Gettier cases involve veritic luck. In Gettier’s Case II presented above, Smith’s belief that J or B is veritically lucky: Given Smith’s misleading evidence of Jones’s Ford-ownership status and her total lack of evidence concerning Brown’s whereabouts, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s belief that J or B is true. Veritic luck with respect to p is incompatible with knowing that p, because it undercuts the connection between S’s evidence for p and the truth of p in a way that makes it entirely coincidental from S’s point of view that p is true.

Engel then uses the distinction between evidential and veritic luck to assess Harman cases. Jill is not veritically lucky in believing that the President has been assassinated, for she has accurate, reliable evidence concerning the assassination in the form of a reputable newspaper’s column, and given this evidence, it is not a matter of luck that her belief is true. However, Jill is evidentially lucky—she is lucky to be in the evidential situation that she is in, for had she turned on the TV and seen the fabricated retraction, she would have been in a much worse evidential situation vis-à-vis the President’s assassination. Lucky for her, she did not turn on the TV Like the bank teller above, Jill is lucky to have the evidence she does, but given her evidence, she is not lucky that her belief is true. Having argued that only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge, Engel concludes that Jill does know the President has been assassinated. If Engel is right, then Harman cases do not provide examples of knowledge-undermining luck.

ii. Justification-Oriented Luck

Hamid Vahid (2001) maintains that there are two types of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. He agrees with Engel that veritic luck as characterized by VL is incompatible with knowledge, but he argues, contra Engel, that there is a kind of evidential luck (which he dubs ‘justification-oriented luck’) that is also incompatible with knowledge. Vahid contends that knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck is a function of how easily a person’s belief could have been unjustified:

(JL) A person suffers from knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck, when she is justified in believing that p, but given her epistemic circumstances, she could have easily been unjustified in holding that very belief.

Vahid contends that Harman’s Assassination case provides an example of knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck. Jill could have easily been unjustified in believing that the President was assassinated. Had she turned on the TV like she usually does, she would not have been justified in holding that belief. Vahid concludes that Jill does not know that the President was assassinated—her knowledge is destroyed by justification-oriented luck.

While JL might yield the right result in Harman’s Assassination case, it seems to yield the wrong result with respect to the bank teller case. The teller is justified in believing that the bank president is the robber because she just happened to look up during the brief moment when his mask had slipped and clearly saw the robber’s face, but she could have easily been unjustified in this belief. Had she continued to look in her cash drawer while nervously collecting the cash for the robber, she would not have seen the robber’s face. Clearly, the teller knows that the bank president is the robber, and yet, JL implies that she lacks such knowledge.

iii. Modal Veritic Luck

Duncan Pritchard (2003) agrees that, of these types of luck, only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge, but he replaces Engel’s evidence-based characterization of veritic luck with the following modal analysis:

(MVL) For all agents S and propositions p, the truth of S’s belief that p is veritically lucky if and only if S’s belief that p is true in the actual world a but false in nearly all nearby possible worlds in which S forms the belief in the same manner as in a.

MVL differs from VL in the following way: it concerns the connection between the method of belief formation and proposition believed, rather than the connection between S’s evidence and the proposition for which it is evidence. Pritchard argues that a safety-based neo-Moorean account, according to which knowledge is safe true belief, is capable of eliminating veritic luck. In a moment, we will see, contra Pritchard, that safe true belief is incapable of ruling out certain paradigm cases of veritic luck.

g. Second-Wave Anti-Luck Epistemologies

The post-Gettier literature is rife with attempts at supplementing or amending the traditional JTB-analysis with a satisfactory anti-luck constraint on knowledge. As surveyed in Section 1, the first wave of proposals included adding a no-false-grounds or no-essential-false-grounds condition to JTB, supplementing JTB with a defeasibility condition, incorporating an externalistic justification condition in JTB, and replacing JTB with a causal theory of knowing. These and similar proposals have fallen prey to ever-more-complicated Gettier-style examples. The general consensus is that none of these proposals succeeds. Second-wave luck-eliminating proposals invoke counterfactual or subjunctive constraints on knowing, principal among them: sensitivity and safety. Let us consider each of these proposals in turn.

i. Sensitivity

S’s belief that p is sensitive to p’s truth-value if and only if S would not believe that p if p were false (that is, if and only if S does not believe p in any of the closest ~p-worlds). To be sure, sensitive belief does preclude veritic luck, but it does so at a steep price. First, the sensitive-true-belief account of knowledge results in closure failure. Second, there are compelling reasons to think that knowledge does not require sensitivity. Let’s examine each cost in turn.

Most epistemologists regard it as all but axiomatic that we can expand our knowledge by competently deducing some currently unknown proposition u from some other known proposition k whenever we know that k entails u. This widely-embraced idea is codified in the principle of epistemic closure which has been formulated in each of the following ways:

(PEC1) If S knows that p and S knows that p entails q, then S knows (or is in a position to know) that q.

(PEC2) If (i) S knows that p, (ii) S knows that p entails q, (iii) S competently deduces q from her knowledge that p and that p entails q, and (iv) S comes to believe q as a result of that competent deduction, then S knows that q.

One reason the principle of epistemic closure has enjoyed such widespread endorsement is this: If I know that p and know that p entails q and I deduce and come to believe q from that knowledge, my belief that q could not be false (because knowledge is factive and the truth of p entails q, together with the truth of p, guarantees the truth of q).

The following example illustrates why sensitive-true-belief accounts of knowledge result in closure failure. I currently believe that I am in a coffee shop [C]. My belief that C is sensitive. If I were not in a coffee shop, I would not believe that I was, for if I were not in a coffee shop, I would be somewhere else, for example, the grocery store or my office, and would not mistakenly think that I was at a coffee shop. Since my belief that C is sensitive (that is, I would not believe it if it were false), the sensitive-true-belief account of knowledge entails that I know that C. I also currently believe that I am not at home in bed having a lifelike dream of being in a coffee shop [~H], but my belief that ~H is not sensitive, for if I were at home in bed having a lifelike dream of being in a coffee shop (that is, if ~H were false), I would still believe that ~H. So, according to the sensitive-true-belief account, I do not know that ~H. Of course, my being at the coffee shop entails that I am not at home in bed dreaming that I am in a coffee shop (that is, C ==> ~H), and I know that C ==> ~H. The sensitive-true-belief account results in closure failure because it entails that I know that C and know that C ==> ~H, but I do not know (and cannot come to know) that ~H on that basis.

Most epistemologists regard the principle of epistemic closure to be so plausible that they find any theory of knowledge that results in closure failure deeply problematic if not outright absurd. In fairness to sensitivity theorists, they recognize that their theories entail closure failure and acknowledge the antecedent implausibility of closure failure, but they argue that, despite its counterintuitiveness, there are principled reasons for thinking that knowledge is not closed under known implication. They grant that we have all sorts of ordinary knowledge, but insist that we do not know and cannot know that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false. Thus, they embrace closure failure because they think that it accurately captures our actual epistemic situation. Perhaps sensitivity theorists are right, but given how widely accepted the principle of epistemic closure is, it would be preferable to identify an anti-luck constraint that avoids closure failure.

The second major problem facing the sensitivity proposal, as Jonathan Vogel (1999) shows with Hole-In-One, is that knowledge does not require sensitivity. The fourth hole at Augusta National Golf Course where The Masters is played is a tricky 240-yard par 3, euphemistically called “Flowering Crabapple.” In 2007, not one player shot a hole-in-one on this diabolical hole, and there were only eleven birdies throughout four rounds of play. Right now, I know that not all seventy-two players in this year’s Masters will shoot a hole-in-one on Flowering Crabapple in the first round of play, but my belief to this effect is not sensitive. Were every golfer to shoot a hole-in-one on Flowering Crabapple in Round One of the Masters in defiance of the astronomical odds against it, I would still believe that they were not going to do so. So, sensitivity is not necessary for knowledge.

ii. Safety

Considerations such as these have led a number of epistemologists (Sosa 1999 & 2000, Williamson 2000a & 2000b, Pritchard 2005) to replace the sensitivity condition with some sort of safety condition. Safety comes in different strengths: S’s true belief that p is strongly safe if and only if were S to believe that p, p would be true (that is, in all the closest worlds where S believes p, p is true). S’s true belief that p is weakly safe if and only if S would not easily be mistaken with respect to p (that is, in the overwhelming majority of nearby worlds where S believes that p, p is true).

Peter Murphy (2005) employs Saul Kripke’s famous counterexample to sensitivity to show that strong safety results in closure failure. Suppose the following is true of Fake Barn County: The landscape is peppered with barn façades, there are a few real barns in the county, some of the real barns are red and some are blue, but all of the façades are red. Driving through Fake Barn County, Mary is unaware that the most of the barn-looking structures are façades. She looks at a blue barn and comes to believe that she is looking at a blue barn. Her belief is safe. In all nearby worlds where she believes she is looking at a blue barn, she is looking at a blue barn, for there are no blue façades. However, her belief that she is looking at a barn is not safe. There are many nearby worlds where she believes she’s looking at a barn, but is really just looking at a façade. So, strong safety entails that Mary knows she’s looking at a blue barn, but does not know she’s looking at a barn.

Weak safety is open to a different worry. If knowledge only requires weakly-safe justified true belief, then a person who justifiably believes her lottery ticket will lose knows that her ticket will lose (unless, of course, it happens to win), because in the overwhelming majority of nearby worlds, her ticket is a loser. Many epistemologists (though not all) insist that people do not know their lottery tickets will lose, prior to hearing the announced results. Anyone convinced that people do not know their tickets will lose, before learning of the results, will think that weak safety is too weak of an anti-luck constraint on knowledge.

Avram Hiller and Ram Neta (2007) convincingly argue that no safe belief condition can eliminate all cases of veritic luck as follows: Start with a justified-but-false-and-unsafe belief like Smith’s belief that Jones owns a Ford. Next, have Smith justifiably infer a disjunction of the form J or ~G, where Smith has no evidence whatsoever that ~G is true and where unbeknownst to Smith, ~G is true in all nearby worlds. Let ~G = Brown will not win a Grammy. Suppose that, unbeknownst to Smith, Brown is totally devoid of musical talent and there is no remotely close world where Brown wins a Grammy. Then, Smith’s true belief that J or ~G will be safe, but veritically lucky nonetheless, because given Smith’s evidence, it is just a matter of luck that J or ~G is true. Since the safe-true-belief account cannot rule out all cases of veritic luck, safe-true-belief is not sufficient for knowledge.

Hiller and Neta’s example also shows that Pritchard’s modal account of veritic luck [MVL] is not the correct analysis of veritic luck. Smith’s belief that J or ~G is clearly veritically lucky: Smith bases her belief that J or ~G on her justified-but-false-and-unsafe-belief that Jones owns a Ford. Since Smith has absolutely no knowledge or evidence of Brown’s total lack of musical talent, given Smith’s evidence, it is just a matter of luck that her belief that J or ~G is true. But MVL entails that Smith’s belief is not veritically lucky. According to MVL, a belief is veritically lucky if it is true in the actual world but false in nearly all nearby worlds where Smith forms the belief in the same manner. In Hiller and Neta’s case, Smith’s belief that J or ~G is true in the actual world, but it is also true in all nearby worlds where it is formed in the same way (because ~G is true in all nearby worlds). Thus, according to MVL, Smith’s belief that J or ~G is not veritically lucky. Since Smith’s belief is veritically lucky, the MVL analysis of veritic luck is mistaken.

h. Paradox Lost

The paradox of epistemic luck dissolves once we recognize that the incompatibility thesis is false. Not all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge. Certainly propositional, existential, and facultative luck are compatible with knowledge, and at least some forms of evidential luck, like the evidential luck had by the bank teller above, are also compatible with knowledge. There is growing consensus that veritic luck is the principal form of knowledge-destroying luck. Since veritic luck is far from ubiquitous, the incompatibility of veritic luck with knowledge poses no general threat to the possibility of knowledge. One can know that p whenever it is not a matter of veritic luck that one’s justified belief that p is true.

3. Epistemic Luck and Knowing that One Knows

Although there remains broad disagreement over how exactly to formulate the condition needed to rule out knowledge-destroying epistemic luck in a theory of knowledge, there is widespread consensus that whatever the correct condition is, S does not need to know that that condition has been met in order to know that p. The point can be illustrated as follows: Let the expression “S is not Gettiered with respect to p” serve as a placeholder for whatever the correct substantive luck-eliminating condition is. If we add this condition to the traditional justified-true-belief analysis, we get the following schema for analyzing knowledge:

(K) S knows that p if and only if:

(i) p is true,

(ii) S believes that p,

(iii) S is justified in believing that p, and

(iv) S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

According to (K), S does not need to know that conditions (i)-(iv) are met in order to know that p. All that (K) requires for S to know that p is that conditions (i)-(iv) be met. Since S need not know or even believe that she is not Gettiered with respect to p in order to know that p, the possibility of Gettier-style, knowledge-destroying, veritic luck poses no special obstacle to first-order knowledge (where ‘first-order knowledge’ refers to knowing that p and ‘second-order knowledge’ refers to knowing that one knows that p). As long as S is not veritically lucky with respect to p, she will know that p, according to schema (K), provided she has a justified true belief that p.

The situation seems to be quite different when it comes to knowing that one knows, for one of the most natural ways of coming to know that one knows that p is by knowing that one has met the conditions required for knowing that p, and knowing the latter requires knowing that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. The burden of the present section is to examine whether the phenomenon of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck undermines more reflective forms of knowledge, such as, knowing that one knows.

a. Internalism, Epistemic Luck, and the Problem of Knowing that One Knows

Arch internalist H.A. Pritchard (1950) famously remarked: “We must recognize that whenever we know something we either do, or at least can, by reflecting, directly know that we are knowing it.” Other internalists have been less sanguine about the prospects of second-order knowledge. For example, Roderick Chisholm (1986) argues that one cannot generally know that one knows on the grounds that one cannot generally know whether or not one’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations. Is Chisholm right? Does the Gettier problem pose special—indeed, generally insurmountable—obstacles to internalistically knowing that one internalistically knows that p? Richard Feldman (1981) does not think so. He thinks that the Gettier problem poses a minor obstacle to second-order knowledge, but one that can be easily overcome with minimal intellectual effort. Mylan Engel Jr. (2000) disagrees. Siding with Chisholm, Engel argues that the Gettier problem poses three distinct challenges to second-order knowledge, which, when taken together, threaten to undermine the possibility of knowing that one knows. Michael Roth (1990) contends that the Gettier problem poses no threat to second-order knowledge whatsoever. To assess these competing views, it will be helpful to have a clearer idea of just what is required for internalistic knowledge.

Post-Gettier internalists with respect to knowledge tend to work within the JTB+ tradition in that they maintain that, in addition to true belief, knowledge requires internalistic justification as well as some fourth externalistic anti-luck condition to rule out Gettier cases. Accordingly, by replacing condition (iii) in schema (K) above with an explicitly internalistic justification condition, we arrive at a schema for internalistic knowledge that most internalists would readily embrace:

(K_i) S internalistically knows (knows_i) that p if and only if:

(k1) p is true,

(k2) S believes that p,

(k3) S is internalistically justified (justified_i) in believing that p, and

(k4) S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Since (K_i) provides a perfectly general account of knowledge_i, we can arrive at the conditions for second-order knowledge_i simply by substituting S knows_i that p for p in schema (K_i):

(K_iK_i) S knows_i that S knows_i that p if and only if:

(kk1) S knows_i that p is true,

(kk2) S believes that S knows_i that p,

(kk3) S is justified_i in believing that S knows_i that p, and

(kk4) S is not Gettiered with respect to S knows_i that p.

Chisholm doubts that (kk3) can be satisfied. To appreciate Chisholm’s worry, consider one of the most natural and straightforward ways of satisfying condition (kk3), namely, being justified_i in believing that one has met all of the conditions required for knowing_i that p:

(J_iK_ip) S is justified_i in believing that S knows_i that p if and only if:

(jk1) S is justified_i in believing that p,

(jk2) S is justified_i in believing that S believes that p,

(jk3) S is justified_i in believing that S is justified_i in believing that p, and

(jk4) S is justified_i in believing that S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Since (jk1) is identical to (k3), (jk1) is satisfied whenever S knows_i that p; and if we assume both doxastic and justificational_i transparency (that is, if we assume that we have introspective access to what we believe and to our justification_i for what we believe), as do many internalists, then (jk2) and (jk3) also pose no special problems for the would-be second-order knower.

Chisholm’s concern is with (jk4). He contends that we cannot typically tell whether or not our evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations. Based on this contention, Chisholm argues as follows: Let S be any one of us and let p be a proposition that S knows_i. Since S cannot tell whether S’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations, S is not justified_i in believing that S is not Gettiered with respect to p. Hence, (jk4) is not satisfied. Since (jk4) is not satisfied, S is not justified_i in believing that S knows_i that p, that is, (kk3) is not satisfied. Since (kk3) is a necessary condition for knowing_i that one knows_i that p, S does not know_i that S knows_i that p. The gist of Chisholm’s argument is this: Since we are not justified_i in believing that we are not Gettiered with respect to p, we do not know_i that we know_i that p.

Feldman disagrees. He thinks that, with minimal effort, a person who knows_i that p can be justified_i in believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p. Feldman offers two reasons for thinking that it is relatively easy to be justified_i in believing that one’s evidence for p is not defective and thus that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. Since Feldman is primarily concerned with determining when a person who knows_i that p knows_i that she knows_i that p, he assumes that S has first-order knowledge_i that p when presenting his reasons.

No False Evidence

Assume that S knows_i that p. S’s knowing_i that p entails that S is justified_i in believing that p. Since S is justified_i in believing that p, S is also justified_i in believing that all of her evidence for p is true. Since false evidence is usually what makes one’s evidence defective, S is justified_i in believing that her justification_i for p is not defective and thus that she is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Induction

Since S has very rarely found herself to be the victim of Gettier-type situations, she is justified_i in believing that such situations are very rare and atypical. Given their rarity and atypicality, S is justified_i in believing that she is not is such a situation with respect to p.

Feldman contends that No False Evidence and Induction provide S with good internalistic reasons for believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p. Since internalistic justification is a function of having good internalistic reasons and S has good internalistic reasons for believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p, S is justified_i in believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p, that is, (jk4) is satisfied. Since (jk1)-(jk3) are also easily satisfiable, with minimal intellectual effort, S can be justified_i in believing that she knows_i that p. Feldman concludes that satisfying (kk3) poses no special obstacle to knowing_i that one knows_i.

Engel contends that the Gettier problem generates three distinct challenges for the would-be second-order knower—challenges that threaten to undermine the satisfaction of (kk1), (kk3), and (kk4), respectively:

(1) First-order actual Gettierization: One way the Gettier problem can preclude S from knowing_i that she knows_i that p is by preventing S from knowing_i that p. If S is Gettiered with respect to p, then S fails to know_i that p, and thus, she fails to know_i that she knows_i that p, since (kk1) is unsatisfied. However, since first-order actual Gettierization precludes second-order knowledge_i only when it obtains, it poses no greater threat to second-order knowledge_i than it poses to first-order knowledge_i.

(2) First-order possible (but non-actual) Gettierization: While actual first-order Gettierization, when it obtains, undermines second-order knowledge_i by falsifying (kk1), possible (but non-actual) first-order Gettierization threatens to thwart one of the most natural ways of satisfying (kk3), namely, satisfying conditions (jk1)-(jk4) of J_iK_ip. Like Chisholm, Engel’s concern here is with (jk4). He argues that the reasons Feldman offers—No False Evidence and Induction—do not provide adequate reasons for thinking that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. No False Evidence is not a good reason to think that one has not been Gettiered with respect to p because, as noted in Section 1, there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases, a point that Feldman himself demonstrated in an earlier article (Feldman, 1974). While No False Evidence may provide S with a reason for thinking that she is not the victim of a Gettier case involving a justified-false-belief, it provides her with no reason to think that she is not the victim of an all-true-evidence Gettier case. The problem with Induction is that many of the Gettier cases described in the literature are what we might call “invisible” Gettier cases, that is, they are cases such that, were they to obtain, the Gettier victim would never find out. They are cases that look and feel like knowledge and pass away unnoticed. Unless Pyromaniac Pete is wearing a Geiger counter, he will never discover that it was Q-radiation and not striking friction that caused his defective Sure Fire match to light. Unless John Lock interrogates Lucy Lock about her morning routine, he will likely never discover that she unlocked the doors to their house at 10:30 a.m. Unless Henry leaves the highway and investigates, he will likely never discover that most of the barn-looking structures are façades. Considerations such as these make it plausible to think that invisible Gettier cases are more likely to be the norm than visible Gettier cases. The fact that S has rarely found herself to be Gettiered in the past may provider her with a reason for thinking that visible Gettier cases are rare, but it provides her no reason to think that invisible Gettier cases are rare, and without such a reason, she is not justified_i in believing that she is not being (invisibly) Gettiered with respect to p. Engel concludes that it is much more difficult to be justified_i in believing that one is not Gettiered with respect to p than Feldman alleges.

(3) Meta-Gettierization: Engel dubs second-order Gettierization “meta-Gettierization.” Just as first-order Gettierization occurs when S’s justification for p is defective in a way that makes S veritically lucky with respect to p, meta-Gettierization occurs when S’s justification for believing that S knows_i that p is defective in a way that makes S veritically lucky with respect to S knows_i that p. By way of illustration, Engel asks us to consider Professor Cleaver, a fictitious philosophy professor from the 1950s, who, as a pre-Gettier epistemologist, justifiably accepts the JTB-analysis of knowledge. Since Cleaver is justified_i in believing that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief, he is justified_i in believing that (jk1)-(jk3) are jointly sufficient for being justified_i in believing that one knows_i that p. Since he is justified_i in believing that (jk1)-(jk3) are jointly sufficient for being justified_i in believing that one knows_i that p, he is justified_i in believing that he knows_i that p provided that he is justified_i in believing that he has justified_i-true-belief that p. Let p be a proposition that Cleaver knows_i. If he believes that he knows_i that p, and if he is justified_i in believing that he knows_i that p on the basis of his justified_i-but-false-belief that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief, together with his justified_i-true-belief that he has a justified_i-true-belief that p, then Cleaver will have a justified_i-true-belief that he knows_i that p, which falls short of knowledge_i because his justification_i essentially depends on his justified_i-but-false-belief that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief. The point generalizes. Anytime that Cleaver comes to believe that he knows_i that p on the basis of his justified_i-but-false-belief that the JTB-analysis is correct, he will automatically be meta-Gettierized and will, thus, fail to know_i that he knows_i that p. Engel then argues that whether those of us who have grown up in the post-Gettier enlightenment can avoid Cleaver’s fate depends on whether any of us justifiedly_i believes a true epistemology. Since no epistemology to date is immune to objection, Engel thinks it doubtful that any of us holds a true epistemology (no matter how well justified_i we might be in our preferred epistemology). Given how likely it is that we are operating with a false epistemology, Engel contends that whenever we come to believe that we know_i that p on the basis of our preferred epistemology, we are almost certain to become yet another meta-Gettier casualty, for we are almost certain to have based our belief that we know_i that p on a justified_i false belief about the requirements for knowledge_i.

Roth contends that the debate over whether the Gettier problem poses a major or minor obstacle to second-order knowledge_i is entirely misguided. He argues that Gettier considerations pose no obstacle to second-order knowledge_i whatsoever. His argument is rooted in what he calls the Fallibilist Assumption Governing Empirical Knowledge:

(FA) For every proposition of the form Kp (where p is empirical and K is the knowledge operator), there are certain contingencies such that: (i) their obtaining is physically possible, (ii) were they to obtain, Kp would be false, and (iii) S is completely justified in disregarding any of these contingencies in considering whether she has adequate justification for p.

Roth contends that there are two types of Kp-falsifying contingencies. “Type I contingencies” satisfy conditions (i), (ii), and (iii) of (FA). “Type II contingencies” satisfy conditions (i) and (ii), but not (iii). Roth asks us to imagine a great dividing wall – The Wall of Fallibilism – that separates the Type I contingencies from the Type II contingencies. As Roth envisions it, the Wall of Fallibilism plays an important role in protecting us from knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. If, given S’s evidence for p in circumstances C, it is simply a matter of luck that p is true in C, then S does not know that p in C. To ensure that it is not just a matter of veritic luck that S’s belief that p is true (in C), S must be suitably protected from error with respect to p (in C). According to Roth, the Wall protects us from the slings and arrows of outrageous Type I error possibilities by cordoning us off from these remote properly ignorable Kp-falsifying contingencies. We do not need evidence that these contingencies do not obtain in order to know_i that p. Being safely outside the Wall, we do not need to take them into account in our epistemic reflections at all. Their sheer remoteness and improbability protects us from having to worry about them. As long as they do not actually obtain, these contingencies provide no obstacle to knowledge_i whatsoever. But the Wall does not provide us with all the protection from luck and error that we need in order to possess knowledge_i. We must also be protected from error with respect to those Type II contingencies that are inside the Wall. These p-falsifying contingencies are genuinely in doubt. Were any of these contingencies to obtain, p would be false, and as a result, so too would Kp. To protect us from these realistic non-ignorable ~p-possibilities, we need justification that precludes them. The picture of fallible knowledge_i that emerges is this:

S knows_i that p only if (i) S’s justification_i is strong enough to rule out all of the relevant Type II ~p-possibilities inside the Wall and (ii) none of the Type I contingencies outside the Wall obtain.

Roth thinks that the Wall metaphor explains why Gettier considerations pose no obstacle to second-order knowledge_i. Gettier considerations are paradigm cases of Type I contingencies. We do not need to know_i or even believe that Type I contingencies do not obtain in order to know_i that p. As long as no Type I contingencies obtain, S will know_i that p provided she satisfies the other conditions required for knowing_i that p. Like Type I contingencies generally, Gettier considerations only undermine knowledge_i when they obtain. We do not need to know_i or even believe that no Gettier circumstances obtain in order to know_i that p. As long as they do not obtain, we will know_i that p provided we have met the other conditions required for knowing_i that p. Since Gettier contingencies are outside the Wall, Roth contends that it is perfectly proper to ignore them when trying to determine whether one knows_i that p.

Roth’s reason for thinking that Gettier contingencies pose no obstacle to knowing_i that one knows_i is that he thinks that Gettier possibilities are properly ignorable Type I contingencies that lie safely outside the Wall. The problem with Roth’s argument is that the Wall’s location is not fixed. As Roth himself admits, where the Wall is situated is relativized to a particular attempt to acquire knowledge_i of a particular proposition. Which contingencies are outside the Wall and which are not, that is, which contingencies are properly ignorable and which are not, is a function of the proposition one is attempting to come to know_i and the circumstances under which one is trying to come to know_i it. While Gettier contingencies vis-à-vis p are clearly properly ignorable where coming to know_i that p is concerned, they are not properly-ignorable when it comes to knowing_i that Kp. To the contrary, it seems that Kp-destroying Gettier contingencies are precisely the kind of contingencies that one needs to be able to rule out in order to know that one knows that p. Gettier contingencies are not p-falsifying contingencies (for p is true in Gettier situations), but they are Kp-falsifying contingencies. As such, they are Type I contingencies when it comes to knowing_i that p, but Type II contingencies when it comes to knowing_i that one knows_i that p. In effect, the Wall moves outward where second-order knowledge_i is concerned. The very same Gettier contingencies that are outside the p-Wall are inside the Kp-Wall. Being inside the Kp-Wall, they are not properly ignorable when it comes to knowing_i that Kp. To know_i that one knows_i that p, one must know_i that no Gettier Kp-falsifying contingencies obtain. It is precisely because we cannot generally know_i that no Gettier contingencies obtain that Chisholm and Engel contend that second-order knowledge_i is difficult to attain.

b. Epistemic Luck and Reflective Knowledge

Even if veritic luck poses no special problem for reflectively knowing that one knows, Duncan Pritchard contends that another more worrisome kind of epistemic luck does preclude such knowledge. Reflective epistemic luck arises when, from the agent’s reflective position, it is just a matter of luck that her belief is true. More precisely:

MRL For all S and p, the truth of S’s belief that p is reflectively lucky if and only if S’s belief that p is true in the actual world but, in nearly all nearby possible worlds consistent with what S is able to know by reflection alone, were S to believe p, p would be false.

When it comes to modal reflective luck, the epistemically relevant possible worlds are ordered in a non-standard way solely in terms of what the agent is able to know on the basis of her subjective internal reflections alone. Accordingly, any possible world consistent with S’s having that same internally accessible evidence that she has in the actual world will be reflectively equally close to the actual world. Since, by hypothesis, S would have exactly the same internally accessible evidence in a demon world or a BIV-world that she has in the actual world, these worlds are just as close, reflectively, to the actual world as is the world where everything is just as it seems. Since our ordinary commonsense perceptual beliefs are false in a wide variety of these reflectively equally close skeptical-scenario possible worlds, Pritchard maintains that MRL entails that our ordinary commonsense perceptual beliefs—if true in the actual world—are reflectively lucky. [Whether MRL actually entails that all of our true commonsense perceptual beliefs are reflectively lucky is by no means obvious. The fact that our commonsense beliefs are false in malevolent demon and BIV worlds does not show that these beliefs are false in nearly all reflectively equally close possible worlds. After all, for every malevolent demon world where we are systematically deceived, there is a corresponding benevolent demon world that is just as close, reflectively, in which the benevolent demon sees to it that all of our commonsense beliefs are true.]

Pritchard thinks that reflective luck is not incompatible with ordinary knowledge (he thinks only veritic luck is), but he insists that reflective luck is incompatible with a much-desired internalistic kind of robust reflective knowledge. Pritchard contends that skeptical challenges force us to confront the fundamental human epistemic predicament, to wit, that we cannot know, on the basis of reflection alone, that the skeptic’s radical hypotheses are false. For example, he thinks that we cannot know, by reflection alone, that we are not bodiless brains being kept alive in vats of nutrient being deceived into thinking we have hands.

If Pritchard is right that we lack reflective knowledge that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false, then those who think that reflective knowledge is closed under known entailment face an even greater skeptical threat. According to the principle of epistemic closure (PEC1): If S knows that p and also knows that p entails q, then S either knows or is in a position to know that q. Since we know that having hands entails not being a deceived bodiless brain in a vat, if we cannot have reflective knowledge that we are not deceived bodiless brains in vats, then given PEC1, we cannot have reflective knowledge that we have hands. The point can, of course, be generalized. Since radical skeptical hypotheses are incompatible with virtually all of the ordinary propositions we routinely take ourselves to know, if we lack reflective knowledge that radical skeptical hypotheses are false, then we lack reflective knowledge of the most mundane of ordinary propositions.

Pritchard contends that skeptical challenges force us to recognize the reflectively lucky nature of our anti-skeptical beliefs and that this, in turn, explains the enduring epistemic angst that skeptical hypotheses engender. Pritchard argues that the ineliminability of reflective luck shows that we not only lack reflective knowledge that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false, we also lack reflective knowledge that our ordinary commonsense beliefs are true. If Pritchard is right, we may, indeed, possess a great deal of ordinary knowledge, but the ineliminability of reflective luck will forever preclude us from reflectively being able to tell that we do.

4. Conclusion

Reflecting on the nature and scope of epistemic luck gives us deeper insight into the nature and scope of knowledge. Gettier cases demonstrate that fallible justification is not capable of ruling out all forms of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck and that thus knowledge requires more than justified true belief. Just what anti-luck condition must be added justified true belief to arrive at an adequate analysis of knowledge remains an open question.

Recognizing which forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge and which are not puts us one step closer to identifying the correct luck-eliminating condition. It is now generally acknowledged that veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Whether other forms of epistemic luck, such as, justification-oriented luck, are incompatible with knowledge is a question that deserves more attention. At a minimum, any adequate theory of knowledge must be capable of ruling out all cases of veritic luck and to date no theory has been able to do so.

The possibility of knowledge-destroying veritic luck poses no special skeptical threat where first-order knowledge is concerned. As long as a person is not veritically lucky with respect to p, she will know that p, provided she has met the other conditions required for knowledge. The situation appears to be different where second-order knowledge is concerned. While there is no consensus to date as to how serious an obstacle the Gettier problem poses for second-order knowledge, it poses enough of an obstacle to such knowledge to render implausible the once widely held KK-thesis according to which knowing entails knowing that one knows.

Veritic luck is not the only form of epistemic luck that threatens more reflective forms of knowledge. Reflective luck also threatens to undermine the possibility of reflectively knowing that one knows. Our apparent inability to know, on the basis of reflection alone, that the skeptic’s radical hypotheses are false, together with the principle of epistemic closure, threatens to undermine the possibility of reflective knowledge altogether.

5. References and Further Reading

Chisholm, Roderick. 1986. “The Place of Epistemic Justification.” Philosophical Topics 14: 85-92.
- Argues that one cannot generally know that one knows on the grounds that one cannot generally know whether or not one’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations.
Chisholm, Roderick. 1964. “The Ethics of Requirement.” American Philosophical Quarterly 1: 147-153.
- Provides a No Defeaters response to the Gettier problem.
Clarke, Michael. 1963. “Knowledge and Grounds: A Comment on Mr. Gettier’s Paper.” Analysis XXIV: 46-48.
- Argues that No False Grounds is mistaken since S can derive a justified true belief that p from a justified true belief that q and still fail to know that p because S’s grounds for q are false. Contends that knowledge is “fully grounded” justified true belief, where in order to be fully grounded, the chain of reasons leading up to S’s proximate grounds for p must itself contain no false grounds at any point in the chain.
Coffman, E.J. 2007. “Thinking about Luck.” Synthese 158: 385-398.
- Defends a lack of control account of luck.
Dretske, Fred. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 49: 1-22.
- Argues that in order to rule out knowledge-destroying luck, one’s reasons for p must be conclusive in the sense that one would not have had those reasons if p were false.
Engel Jr., Mylan. 2000. “Internalism, the Gettier Problem, and Metaepistemological Skepticism.” Grazer Philosophische Studien 60: 99-117.
- Argues that the Gettier problem poses three distinct challenges to second-order knowledge which, when taken together, threaten to undermine the possibility of knowing that one knows.
Engel Jr., Mylan. 1992. “Is Epistemic Luck Compatible with Knowledge?” Southern Journal of Philosophy 30: 59-75.
- Identifies veritic luck as the principal form of knowledge-destroying luck. Distinguishes veritic luck from evidential luck. Argues that, of these two types of luck, only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Further argues that only externalist epistemologies are capable of ruling out veritic luck.
Feldman, Richard. 1981. “Fallibilism and Knowing that One Knows.” Philosophical Review XC: 266-282.
- Defends the iterative KK-thesis. Argues that the Gettier problem poses a minor, but hardly insurmountable, obstacle to second-order knowledge.
Feldman, Richard. 1974. “An Alleged Defect in Gettier Counterexamples.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 52: 68-69.
- Provides a decisive example of an all-true-evidence Gettier case that shows that No False Grounds is too weak.
Fumerton, Richard. 1995. Metaepistemology and Skepticism. Lanham, MA: Rowman and Littlefield Publishers.
- Argues that second-order knowledge is too easy on externalistic accounts of knowledge and that, therefore, such accounts fail to capture the kind of knowledge that interests us.
Gettier, Edmund. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
- Demonstrates that justified true belief is not sufficient for knowledge. Highlights two paradigm examples of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck.
Greco, John. 2004. “A Different Sort of Contextualism. Erkenntnis 61: 383-400.
- Defends a contextualist virtue epistemology. Offers a situationalist account of veritic luck, that is, an account tied to one’s epistemic situation rather than to one’s evidence: S is veritically lucky in believing that p if and only if, given S’s epistemic situation, it is just a matter of luck that S’s belief that p is true.
Greco, John. 2003. “Virtue and Luck, Epistemic and Otherwise.” Metaphilosophy 34: 353-366.
- Defends a virtue theoretic solution to the Gettier problem. Argues that when S has a true belief that p because S believes out of intellectual virtue (that is, when S’s believing out of intellectual virtue is what accounts for her have a true belief that p rather than a false belief or no belief), then S’s true belief that p is not veritically lucky.
Goldman, Alvin. 1979. “What Is Justified Belief?” In Justification and Knowledge. Ed. George Pappas. Dordrecht, Holland: D. Reidel Publishing Company.
- Develops and defends an externalistic, process reliabilist account of justified belief.
Goldman, Alvin. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy 64: 355-372.
- Attempts to solve the Gettier problem by replacing the traditional justification condition with a causal constraint requiring that one’s belief that p be caused by the fact that makes p true.
Harman, Gilbert. 1973. Thought. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
- Presents three much-discussed examples intended to show that knowledge can be undermined by readily available misleading evidence that one does not possess. Defends a No Essential False Grounds response to the Gettier problem.
Harper, William. 1996. “Knowledge and Luck.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 34: 273-283.
- Demonstrates that the Gettier problem plagues all fallibilistic theories of justification, both internalistic and externalistic alike. Argues that in addition to the traditional justification, truth, and belief conditions, an adequate analysis of knowledge must incorporate a “no luck” condition.
Heller, Mark. 1999. “The Proper Role for Contextualism in an Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 115-29.
- Proposes a context-sensitive modal account of epistemic luck according to which ‘S’s belief that p is epistemically lucky’ is true if and only if there is at least one world (in a contextually-determined set of epistemically relevant worlds) where S’s belief that p is false. Defends a contextualist anti-luck epistemology which maintains that ‘S knows that p’ is true if and only if there is no world (in a contextually-determined set of epistemically relevant worlds) where S’s belief that p is false.
Hetherington, Stephen. 2005. “Gettier Problems.” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- Canvasses various purported solutions to the Gettier problem. Concludes with the contentious suggestion that justified true belief is sufficient for knowledge and that veritically-lucky justified true beliefs, like those in Gettier’s original examples, are actually cases of knowledge.
Hiller, Avram and Ram Neta. 2007. “Safety and Epistemic Luck.” Synthese 158: 303-13.
- Demonstrates that safe true belief is not sufficient for knowledge by providing an example of a veritically lucky safe true belief that clearly falls short of knowledge.
Klein, Peter. 2008. “Useful False Beliefs.” In Epistemology: New Essays. Ed. Quentin Smith. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Argues that there can be beneficial falsehoods—falsehoods essential to one’s justification—that nevertheless give one knowledge.
Klein, Peter. 1971. “A Proposed Definition of Propositional Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 68: 471-482.
- Defends a No Defeaters solution to the Gettier problem.
Lackey, Jennifer. 2007. “Why We Don’t Deserve Credit for Everything We Know.” Synthese 158: 345-361.
- Argues that knowledge is not credit-worthy true belief and that thus virtue theoretic accounts of knowledge are mistaken.
Lackey, Jennifer. 2006. “Pritchard’s Epistemic Luck.” The Philosophical Quarterly 56: 284-289.
- Provides a counterexample to Pritchard’s modal account of luck.
Lehrer, Keith. 1990. Theory of Knowledge. Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
- Defends a coherence theory of justification. Argues that knowledge is undefeated justified true acceptance.
Lehrer, Keith and Thomas Paxson Jr. 1969. “Knowledge: Undefeated Justified True Belief.” The Journal of Philosophy 66: 225-237.
- Defends an alternative No Defeaters response to the Gettier problem. Introduces the Tom Grabit counterexample to the Chisholm/Klein account of defeaters.
Lycan, William. 1977. “Evidence One Does Not Possess.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 55: 114-26.
- Argues that misleading evidence one does not possess does not undermine one’s knowledge and that, thus, Harman Cases are actually cases of knowledge.
Murphy, Peter. 2005. “Closure Failure for Safety.” Philosophia 33: 331-34.
- Adapts Kripke’s famous “blue barn” counterexample to Nozick’s analysis of knowledge to show that safe true belief accounts of knowledge also result in closure failure.
Myers, Robert G. and Kenneth Stern. 1973. “Knowledge without Paradox.” Journal of Philosophy 70: 147-160.
- Argues that p can justify S in believing some other proposition q only if p is true and that, thus, Gettier’s original cases do not provide examples of justified true beliefs that fall short of knowledge.
Nozick, Robert. 1981. “Knowledge and Skepticism.” In Philosophical Explanations. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Develops and defends a sensitivity-based subjunctive conditionals analysis of knowledge.
Plato: Theaetetus in Plato: Collected Dialogues. Eds. E. Hamilton and H. Cairns. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1961.
Pritchard, Duncan. 2005. Epistemic Luck. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Proposes a modal account of veritic luck. Argues that safety precludes veritic luck. Defends an externalist neo-Moorean safe true belief account of ordinary knowledge. Concedes to the skeptic that reflective luck is ineliminable and that such luck is incompatible with reflective knowledge.
Pritchard, Duncan. 2003. “Virtue Epistemology and Epistemic Luck.” Metaphilosophy 34: 106-30.
Pritchard, H.A. 1950. Knowledge and Perception. Oxford: The Clarendon Press.
Riggs, Wayne. 2007. “Why Epistemologists Are So Down on their Luck.” Synthese 158: 329-344.
- Defends a lack of control account of luck. Argues that knowledge is credit-worthy true belief.
Roth, Michael. 1990. “The Wall and the Shield: K-K Reconsidered.” Philosophical Studies 59: 147-157.
- Argues that the Gettier problem poses no obstacle to second-order knowledge on the grounds that Gettier-type contingencies lie safely outside the wall of fallibilism and can simply be ignored (unless they actually obtain).
Russell, Bertrand. 1912. The Problems of Philosophy. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
Skyrms, Brian. 1967. “The Explication of ‘X Knows that p’.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 373-389.
- Provides one of the first cases of an all true evidence Gettier case.
Sosa, Ernest. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume 1. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
- Develops and defends a virtue epistemology which maintains that knowledge is reliably-produced safe true belief, the correctness of which is attributable to one’s epistemic competence. Argues that when the correctness of a reliably-produced safe belief is attributable to the proper exercise of an epistemic competence, then the resultant belief is not epistemically lucky.
Sosa, Ernest. 2000. “Skepticism and Contextualism.” Philosophical Issues, 10, Skepticism: 1-18.
- Defends a non-contextualist safety-based Moorean response to the skeptical paradox.
Sosa, Ernest. 1999. “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 141-54.
- Develops a safety-based Moorean response to the skeptical paradox. Argues that such a response is preferable to skeptical, tracking, relevant-alternative, and contextualist accounts.
Steup, Matthias. 2006. “The Analysis of Knowledge.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- Discusses the necessary conditions for knowledge. Examines internalistic and externalistic analyses of knowledge.
Swain, Marshall. 1981. Reasons and Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Truncellito, David A. 2007. “Epistemology,” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Unger, Peter. 1968. “An Analysis of Factual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 65: 157-70.
- Shows that various forms of epistemic luck – including propositional luck, existential luck, and facultative luck – are compatible with knowledge. Argues that knowledge is non-accidentally true belief.
Vahid, Hamid. 2001. “Knowledge and Varieties of Epistemic Luck.” Dialectica 55: 351-362.
- Argues that truth-oriented veritic luck and justification-oriented luck are both incompatible with knowledge.
Vogel, Jonathan. 1999. “The New Relevant Alternatives Theory.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 155-80.
- Uses Hole-in-One to argue that sensitivity is not necessary for knowledge.
Williamson, Timothy. 2000a. “Scepticism and Evidence.” Philosophy and Phenomenal Research 60: 613-28.
Williamson, Timothy. 2000b. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
Zagzebski, Linda. 1996. Virtues of the Mind. Cambridge, England: Cambridge University Press.
- Characterizes Gettier-style knowledge-destroying luck as cases of “double luck” where epistemic bad luck is cancelled out by epistemic good luck. Argues that no fallibilist epistemology can rule out knowledge-destroying luck. Defends a virtue-based epistemology according to which knowledge is a state of cognitive contact with reality arising out of acts of intellectual virtue, and argues that this definition of knowledge is immune to the Gettier problem because truth is entailed by the other components of the definition.

Author Information

Mylan Engel Jr.
Email: mylan-engel@niu.edu
Northern Illinois University
U. S. A.

Edmund Husserl: Phenomenology of Embodiment

For Husserl, the body is not an extended physical substance in contrast to a non-extended mind, but a lived “here” from which all “there’s” are “there”; a locus of distinctive sorts of sensations that can only be felt firsthand by the embodied experiencer concerned; and a coherent system of movement possibilities allowing us to experience every moment of our situated, practical-perceptual life as pointing to “more” than our current perspective affords. To identify such experiential structures of embodiment, however, Husserl must clarify and set aside not only the ways in which the natural sciences approach the body, but also the ways in which we have tacitly taken over natural-scientific assumptions into our everyday understanding of embodiment. Husserl’s phenomenological investigations eventually lead to the notion of kinaesthetic consciousness, which is not a consciousness “of” movement, but a consciousness or subjectivity that is itself characterized in terms of motility, that is, the very ability to move freely and responsively. In Husserl’s phenomenology of embodiment, then, the lived body is a lived center of experience, and both its movement capabilities and its distinctive register of sensations play a key role in his account of how we encounter other embodied agents in the shared space of a coherent and ever-explorable world. Many of Husserl’s findings were taken up by such later figures in the phenomenological tradition as Heidegger and Merleau-Ponty, who gave these findings an ontological interpretation. However, Husserl’s main focus is epistemological, and for him, lived embodiment is not only a means of practical action, but an essential part of the deep structure of all knowing.

Introduction
1. Sources and Themes
2. Terms and Concepts
Naturalistic Presuppositions about the Body
Embodied Personhood
The Structure of Embodied Experience
Kinaesthetic Consciousness
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

a. Sources and Themes

Edmund Husserl (1859–1938), the founder of phenomenology, addressed the body throughout his philosophical life, with much of the relevant material to be found in lecture courses, research manuscripts, and book-length texts not published during his lifetime. One of the most important texts—the second volume of his Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy, subtitled Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution and usually referred to as Ideas 2—was particularly influential. Heidegger, for example, had access to it in manuscript before writing his own major work, Being and Time (1927), and Merleau-Ponty consulted it while working on his Phenomenology of Perception (1945); indeed, Ideas 2 first became generally known on the basis of Merleau-Ponty’s references to it in Phenomenology of Perception. It has long been known that the text posthumously published in 1952 as Ideas 2 had been shaped by not one, but two editors, Edith Stein and Ludwig Landgrebe (each of whom worked on the text while serving as Husserl’s assistant). But more recent scholarship by Sawicki (1997) suggests that Edith Stein (1891–1942) should be seen as the guiding architect of the work, which she attempted to recast in terms of her own philosophical commitments so as to “correct” what she saw as problems and shortcomings in Husserl’s original 1912 draft. This may be why the text as we currently have it is marked by certain gaps and tensions. In fact, no faithful account of this seminal work will be possible until a new edition is published, fully disentangling Husserl’s own train of thought from Stein’s argument. The present article is therefore based on texts from all periods, and the copious amount of relevant material has been organized in terms of four main tasks of a Husserlian phenomenology of embodiment: bringing naturalistic presuppositions about the body to light; setting aside the naturalized body in favor of embodied personhood; offering phenomenological descriptions of the structure of embodied experience; and demonstrating that transcendental (inter)subjectivity itself must be thought as kinaesthetic consciousness. Before turning to these themes, however, let us pause for a brief overview of some of the key Husserlian terms and concepts used in this article.

b. Terms and Concepts

Husserlian phenomenology stands in opposition to naturalism, for which material nature is simply a given and conscious life itself is part of nature, to be approached with natural-scientific methods oriented toward empirical facts and causal explanations. In contrast, phenomenology turns directly to the evidence of lived experience—of first-person subjective life—in order to provide descriptions of experiencing and of objects as experienced, rather than causal explanations. For Husserl, these descriptions are to be eidetic (or “essential”) insofar as what is being described is not a specific set of empirical facts considered for their own sake, but invariants governing a certain range of facts—for instance, structural patterns that must obtain for something to be an object of a certain type at all, or eidetically necessary laws such as “any conceivable color has some extension.” Husserl’s investigations of essential structures of conscious life and experience further focus on consciousness as transcendental rather than mundane, which means that consciousness is taken not as a part of the world, but as the constitutive presupposition for experiencing any world whatsoever.

Husserl’s technical term constitution takes on many nuances as his work develops. But all constitutive phenomenology is concerned with the correlation between “experiencing” and “that which is experienced”—for example, between perceiving and the perceived, remembering and the remembered, and so on. This “universal a priori of correlation” (Husserliana 6, §46) encompasses not only conscious performances actively carried out by the I (for instance, a judging whose correlate is the corresponding judgment), but also deeper strata of subjective experience that often remain unnoticed in everyday life. They can, however, be brought to light by reflecting on the structure of the type of experience concerned. For example, that only one side of the perceptual object actually appears to me at any given moment has its subjective correlate in the situatedness of embodied experience, so that any spatial thing is always seen from a particular standpoint; at the same time, that I am currently seeing “this side” of the object has its subjective correlate in my capability for movement, since I am able in principle to move in such a way as to bring “other sides” into view. In short, Husserl does not presuppose a subject-object split, but operates with a subject-object correlation—a correlation he works out in detail for almost every sphere and stratum of experience.

Moreover, as the examples indicate, a Husserlian approach to consciousness or subjectivity is not restricted to the realm of the mental as traditionally understood; instead, the phenomenological notion of embodied experience offers an alternative to mind-body dualism. And Husserl’s investigations ultimately embrace not only the achievements and correlates of constituting subjectivity, but also those of intersubjectivity, that is, of the “we” rather than solely the “I.”

Finally, a general feature of Husserl’s terminology must also be mentioned: he frequently takes over words used differently in other contexts and expects the reader to understand these words not in terms of linguistic definitions set forth in advance, but in light of their referents—the experiential features or nuances that he is describing. Thus the Husserlian tradition is not merely a tradition of texts to comment upon or argue against, but a permanent possibility of checking descriptive claims against the touchstone of the appropriate experiential evidence so as to confirm or correct such claims. Bearing this in mind, let us now return to the four main moves accomplished by a Husserlian phenomenology of embodiment: criticizing naturalistic presuppositions about the body; thematizing embodied personhood; describing the structure of embodied experience; and investigating kinaesthetic consciousness.

2. Naturalistic Presuppositions about the Body

Summary: Husserl criticizes the assumption that the body is a psychophysical entity, in order to make “the body as directly experienced by the embodied experiencer concerned” a theme for phenomenological investigation.

Let us begin by sketching Husserl’s response to the philosophical and scientific tradition in which he found himself—and in particular to the naturalism of the positivistic natural sciences, which he addresses through a critique of its presuppositions. He is specifically concerned to demonstrate how a natural-scientific tradition that has inherited a Cartesian dualism of substances (res extensa/res cogitans), and is committed to mathematization as the measure of truth, deals with the “mental” by approaching the “psyche” in terms of the “psychophysical”: it is only by taking intangible minds as localizable in tangible living bodies that natural science can bring the “mental” side of the inherited dualism into the realm of real-spatial causality, and thus into the domain of calculability, prediction, and control. Rather than automatically accepting these assumptions, Husserl brings them to light; traces their historical development; establishes the limits of their legitimacy; and offers an alternative account of “consciousness” or “subjectivity,” an account that relies on rigorous philosophical methods and on a radical turn to the evidence of lived experience, rather than on the assumptions and methods of natural-scientific cognition.

But in the course of carrying out these larger tasks, Husserl highlights a major presupposition concerning embodiment. The received tradition, with its tendency to think in terms of the “psychophysical” (even when one is not actively carrying out psychophysical investigations or making specifically psychophysical claims), not only attempts to tie the “mind” to a material “body,” but is already operating under a more basic assumption—namely, that this body can itself be taken as a physical body (Körper) like any other spatial thing, albeit a thing with certain distinctive sorts of characteristics. For even if “organisms” are the province of special natural sciences (for example, anatomy and physiology) having to do with living rather than non-living things, it is still taken for granted that like “inanimate” objects, the “animate” ones too belong to the realm of real, spatially extended entities to be explained in terms of causal laws. Yet such a presupposition completely ignores what is essential to the body as a lived body (Leib)—as my body, someone’s body, experienced in a unique way by the embodied experiencer concerned. In other words, what is missing in naturalism is the body of embodiment, which must not be taken physically, but as directly experienced from within.

Here Husserl is not challenging the right of scientific practice to approach living bodies in causal terms; in Ideas 3 (originally written in 1912, but not published until 1952), he even proposes a new science—somatology—that would incorporate both physiological investigation of the material properties of the body as a living organism and experiential investigation of firsthand, first-person somatic perception (for example, of sensing tactile contact). But he does indeed insist on clarifying the presuppositions governing natural-scientific cognition, recognizing them for what they are and acknowledging their limits, so that, as he puts it in 1936 in §9h of The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology, we do not “take for true being what is actually a method.” Thus the historical fact that living bodies can be, and have been, approached with natural-scientific methods does not automatically allow us to relegate the body of embodiment to the res extensa side of Cartesian dualism. Instead, appropriate modes of inquiry must be developed to do justice to the body of direct experience.

Accordingly, Husserl not only provides a critique of the presupposition of the “psychophysical” (and of the lived body as a physical body), but opens up several further ways in which a phenomenology of embodiment can be pursued. In Ideas 1 (first published in 1913), he sets the body aside in order to reach the realm of “pure consciousness.” Commentators sometimes mistake this strategic move for Husserl’s “position,” and accuse him of postulating a disembodied, desituated consciousness. But the body that is set out of play here is merely the body that is assumed to be the “physical” half of the inherited dualism. Moreover, this is only the first step in the critique: Husserl is effectively suspending the tacit hegemony of the prevailing presupposition whereby it is automatically accepted, as a matter of course, that the body is a physical reality that is a part of nature—and setting this assumption out of play frees us to address the body and embodiment phenomenologically rather than naturalistically. After suspending the unquestioned validity of naturalistic presuppositions concerning the body, then, the next step is to retrieve the body of experience, and Husserl employs various pivotal distinctions in order to open up the experience of embodiment for phenomenological investigation.

3. Embodied Personhood

Summary: Husserl shows that embodied experience is geared into the world as a communal nexus of meaningful situations, expressive gestures, and practical activities.

One key distinction emphasized in Ideas 2 contrasts the “naturalistic” attitude, as the theoretical attitude within which natural science is practiced, with the “personalistic” attitude that characterizes personal and social experience in the world of everyday life—the “lifeworld” (Lebenswelt), the cultural world that is the province of the cultural or human sciences. Within the personalistic attitude, our intersubjective encounters are always experienced as embodied encounters, and our ongoing practical life is already an embodied one. Thus, for example, we greet one another with culturally specific gestures such as shaking hands; we communicate with others, responding to their facial expressions, gestures, and tones of voice; we use tools in practical, goal-directed actions; we rely on bodily capabilities and develop new skills that improve with practice or grow rusty with disuse; and so on. In other words, what we come upon are others embodying themselves in particular ways (serenely or impatiently, adroitly or clumsily, buoyantly or dragged down by pain or fatigue, and so forth): we immediately see embodied persons, not material objects animated by immaterial minds, and the immediacy of this carnal intersubjectivity is the foundation of community and sociality (with culturally specific “normal” embodiment playing a privileged role as the measure from which the “anomalous” and the “abnormal” diverge). Similarly, we make immediate use of the bodily possibilities at our disposal, which serve as the “means whereby” we carry out our everyday activities, without having to appeal to psychophysical explanations: I simply reach for my cup, pick it up, and drink from it, without ever giving a thought to the neurophysiological processes that allow me to keep my balance as I reach, move the cup without spilling the liquid, and swallow without choking. And even if my abilities are compromised by illness or injury, the lived experience of “I can no longer do it” is qualitatively different from the physician’s causal explanations for my condition.

For the most part, Husserl himself provides passing examples, rather than extended analyses, of embodied experience in the personalistic attitude. Yet if we recall that his aim is not to carry out concrete cultural-scientific investigations but to clarify the philosophical bases of the cultural or human sciences, we can see that his critique of naturalistic presuppositions about the body both secures a theoretical foundation for work in such areas as nonverbal communication (as well as other sorts of studies of embodiment carried out within phenomenological psychology, phenomenological sociology, and so on), and anticipates more recent concerns with socially shaped patterns of embodiment (including, for example, issues of gendered embodiment, as contrasted with the biological “sex” of an individual—although even the medical assignment of sex at birth may display, in certain problematic cases, social/cultural assumptions and priorities).

Husserl’s discussions of the “personalistic” attitude in Ideas 2 are echoed in his extensive discussions of the lifeworld in the Crisis, and several further points concerning embodiment can be made in this connection. First of all, for Husserl, the “prescientific” world of experience is more basic than the “objective” world constituted as a correlate to scientific practice in the naturalistic attitude; for example, natural-scientific investigation of the body as an object presupposes a functioning bodily subjectivity on the part of each of the scientists concerned, for whom their own lived bodies tacitly serve as organs of perception, communication, and action, even while they are engaged in carrying out detailed research into, say, the neurophysiology of motor behavior. At the same time, however, scientific assumptions and constructs “flow back into” everyday lifeworldly language and experience, so that, for instance, I may refer to my own body in anatomical terms as a matter of course, or offer causal explanations (rather than experiential descriptions) of my own bodily condition, even in a casual conversation with a friend. Thus although there is a functional priority of the personalistic over the naturalistic attitude, the former is ongoingly shaped and reshaped by the historical acquisitions of the latter—as well as by its unnoticed philosophical presuppositions and its habitual abstractions. Moreover, despite their important differences, both the naturalistic attitude and the personalistic attitude fall within a more general attitude that Husserl terms the “natural attitude.” In the natural attitude, not only are we typically straightforwardly directed toward objects rather than reflecting on the structures of our own subjective experience, but entities such as “bodies” (whether these are taken as “psychophysical realities” or “embodied persons”) are given as ready-made realities within a pregiven world; even the experiencer for whom such entities are given is him/herself taken as one entity among others in the world. And the natural attitude is both all-pervasive and anonymous—it is so taken for granted that we are not even cognizant of it as an “attitude” at all. But when we do become aware of it, still further insights into embodied experience become possible.

4. The Structure of Embodied Experience

Summary: Husserl’s phenomenological investigations emphasize that the lived body functions as the central “here” from which spatial directions and distances are gauged; that it is the locus of distinctive sorts of directly felt sensations such as the experience of tactile contact; and that it is capable of self-movement, opening a rich range of practical possibilities.

Husserl’s approach to disclosing the natural attitude for what it is and suspending its wholesale, automatic efficacy is termed the phenomenological reduction, which leads us from the natural attitude of everyday life to the phenomenological attitude. Within the phenomenological attitude, we set aside questions framed in terms of an ultimate “being” or “reality” existing utterly in itself; instead, we make experiencing—and correlatively, phenomena, which means whatever is experienced, exactly as experienced—the focus of our investigations. For a phenomenology of embodiment, this means turning to the body of direct experience in a way that is even more radical than acknowledging everyday encounters with embodied persons in the personalistic attitude. Why is it more radical? It is because in everyday practical life, we are typically occupied with things and tasks, and ignore the bodily “means whereby” we perceive things and carry out our activities. Although the “anonymity” of this tacitly functioning, everyday body becomes a key theme in existential phenomenology of the body, Husserl too was well aware of it, and it was his groundbreaking research that initially retrieved this lived body and bodily experience from its anonymity.

a. The Body as a Center of Orientation

One mode of inquiry that Husserl uses in his descriptive investigations of the body of lived experience is eidetic phenomenology. The eidetic reduction—which is the shift whereby we enter the eidetic attitude—takes whatever it is that we are experiencing as but one “example of” a particular structure or possibility. (Although Husserl speaks of “essences” in this connection, his use of the term must be distinguished both from Platonic essences and from more recent concerns with “essentialism.”) Thus, for example, as I write these words, the carrots growing in my garden are to my left; later in the day, when I have moved to a different spot in the sun, the carrots will be to my right. But in each case, what I experience is not an empty, homogeneous, mathematical space; instead, I experience lived space as an oriented space whose directional axes—left/right, above/below, in front/behind—are gauged from my own lived body as the central “here” from which all there’s are “there” and from which things are relatively “near” or “far” (right now, the lettuce is “closer to me” than the carrots). One way to refer to this invariant structural feature of embodied experiencing (of which my current relation to the plants in my garden is but one of innumerable possible variations—each of us could contribute a different example, but they would all be examples “of” the same experiential structure) is to speak of the lived body as the “nullpoint of orientation.” But Husserl’s account is more nuanced than this. Although visual experience does indeed seem to proceed from a “point” somewhere in the head, behind the eyes (so that, for example, what you can see of your nose is “in front,” what you can see of your lower lid is “below,” and so on), Husserl also refers to the bodily “here” as a whole with such expressions as “null-position” and “null-posture,” so that the structure of the experiential “center” need not be point-like. And in exploring, say, the underside of my own chin and jaw with my hand, I may find that I am living in the touching hand as the functional center of orientation and experiencing what I am touching as being “above” this hand. Like all descriptive phenomenological claims, the latter claim—namely, that the functional center of orientation can vary from the central “point” from which vision proceeds—is an invitation to consult the relevant experiential evidence for yourself; is the example I have mentioned a possibility that you can actualize? Can you “find” it, experientially, immediately … or does this structure of experience only emerge after a while, or in a different way? Spiegelberg (1966/1986/2004), for example, explores further experiential variations concerning the lived location of the embodied “center” of experiencing, and more descriptive work on this theme (especially work carried out by phenomenologists of diverse cultural backgrounds) would be welcome.

b. Distinctive Bodily Sensations

However, the lived body is more than a tacit “zero,” an abiding “here” from which spatial dimensions of perception and action unfold; it is not an abstract or empty center, but a filled one, with its own familiar feel, for to be embodied is to experience certain sorts of sensations as “mine” in a unique way. In some passages, Husserl replaces the usual German term for sensations—Empfindungen—with a new term, “Empfindnisse” (translated as “feelings” or “sensings”). Such distinctive sensitivities may be collectively referred to as the “somaesthetic” dimension of experience, including, for example, sensations felt in our bodily depths as well as on our bodily surfaces, and encompassing many nuances beyond “pleasure” and “pain.” But one of Husserl’s most important examples is tactile contact: when you touch my body, you are touching me, and I feel it. Sometimes one and the same episode of touching can be experienced in a double way: I might, for example, be exploring a small sculpture with my fingers, intent on its contours, textures, variations in temperature, and so on, or I can continue to palpate the object, but shift to an experiential attitude focused on sensing myself in contact with it precisely here, in exactly this way—retrieving the “bodily” side of my embodied commerce with the thing. Or I myself can furnish both sides of the example, touching one hand with the other (an example of Husserl’s to which Merleau-Ponty accords great importance). Here it becomes clear not only that my own body can be given to me both as the organ and as the object of touch—both as the means whereby the activity of touching is carried out, and as the phenomenon I experience through this activity (for example, the contours and textures I can feel on the surface of my touched hand)—but also that the same touched hand that is the object explored by the touching hand is itself alive to this contact, feeling it subjectively, so that I am living in this hand too as “mine.” In this connection the term “lived” body may connote a certain “undergoing,” emphasizing “affectivity” (being affected) rather than “activity” (although both are important for Husserl, who routinely mentions them together in his later research manuscripts).

c. Movement and the “I Can”

Nevertheless, actions too are “mine” (albeit in a qualitatively different way than the immediate bodily feelings of contact, pleasure, pain, warmth, cold, and so forth, are). And along with the body’s role as the center of orientation and its unique somaesthetic sensations, Husserl also emphasizes bodily motility—the capability for self-movement per se—as an essential feature of embodiment. “Being able to move” is the foundation for any specific bodily “I do” and for what he typically terms the bodily “I can” (which can be experienced as such even without actually performing the movement concerned—for instance, one can find the lived consciousness, “I can nod my head,” without actually doing it, experiencing it instead as a practical possibility given in the sheer “I could”). The range of the “I can” is enriched when I cultivate my capabilities or learn new skills, although as I have already indicated, it may also be temporarily eroded or permanently truncated in cases of illness or injury, so that the “I can” becomes an “I cannot.” For Husserl, however, the lived experience of embodied motility goes far beyond movement that is actively initiated by the I: there are also movements such as breathing, which normally goes on without my active intervention, yet can indeed be deliberately altered to some extent. Husserl therefore speaks of all such bodily movement as pertaining to the I in a broad sense that encompasses, but also includes more than, the active, awake I. For example, habitual movement patterns such as playing a familiar piece on the piano can indeed proceed without my explicit, moment by moment direction, yet are still lived as “mine,” and although they may often remain marginal, they can also be informed with awareness—or with a kind of “active allowing,” as when I lend them my “fiat” and am consciously letting the movement unfold. Thus here motility is a broader concept than agency in the strict sense whereby an “agent” would be actively, explicitly involved in initiating and directing the action throughout.

5. Kinaesthetic Consciousness

Summary: Husserl describes the articulation of kinaesthetic capabilities into coordinated systems of specific movement possibilities; outlines the “if-then” structure through which actualizing certain kinaesthetic possibilities brings coherent fields of appearances to givenness; suggests how a different “if-then” structure—one linking the deployment of my own kinaesthetic capability with the bodily feel of the movement concerned—is implicated in coming to experience other moving bodies as other sentient beings “like me”; and addresses the tension between “embodiment” as an ongoing dynamic, subjective process and the “body” as one object among others in the world.

Husserl devotes considerable attention to the theme of motility, and sketching out some of this work in more detail will allow us to see how his descriptive phenomenological work on embodiment fits into the larger philosophical context of his constitutive phenomenology (recalling that here “constitution” ultimately refers to the correlations between that which is experienced and the relevant performances and achievements of “consciousness” or “subjectivity”). Here a distinction given terminological form by one of Husserl’s assistants, Ludwig Landgrebe (1902–1991), is particularly helpful: that between the body-as-constituted and the body-as-constituting. The body-as-constituted is the body as experienced, that is, it is “that which” is experienced in the experience; the body-as-constituting is the experiencing body “by means of which” something is experienced. And for Husserl, this embodied, experiencing subjectivity (the body-as-constituting) is above all a kinaesthetic consciousness (Claesges 1964)—not as a consciousness “of” movement, but as a consciousness or subjectivity capable of movement.

a. Systems of Kinaesthetic Capabilities

Thus Husserl’s recourse to “kinaestheses” does not refer to “sense data” (for example, sensations pertaining to muscles or joints) postulated as “ingredients” of perceptual experience (for instance, of my own limbs given to me as material objects moving in space), but to the sheer experience of the subjective capability for movement per se (including the “I could” already mentioned) and to its organization into kinaesthetic systems, each with its own (multidimensional) leeway of movement possibilities. For example, in visual perception, the movement of the eyes alone forms one system; head movement affords a second system; the possibilities of rotating one’s entire body on the spot counts as a third system; and locomotor movement (for instance, walking) adds yet another system. When I turn to the left to look for the bird in the birdbath, my eye, head, and torso movements are typically vectorially combined into one integrated gesture. Turning my head allows me to see farther to my left than if eye movements alone were involved, and turning my torso expands my view beyond what eye and head movements can offer together—but whatever combination of eye, head, and torso movements is swung into play when I hear the splash in the birdbath, “turning to the left” will eventually allow me to bring what initially appeared only at (or beyond) the left-hand periphery of the visual field into the center of the field. Kinaesthetic systems can also stand in for one another—if my arms are full, I may hold the door open with my hip or acknowledge a friend’s wave with a gesture of my head rather than my hand. In this way the interarticulated kinaesthetic systems work together as one total kinaesthetic system whose multifarious possibilities of coordination typically take on the more circumscribed form of a habitual repertoire of familiar movement possibilities and customary ways to move.

Even within this more limited leeway, however, motility is characterized by a certain essential freedom that can be contrasted with the physical motion of spatial objects. This by no means implies complete freedom in every case—once I jump off the diving board, it is too late to change my mind, and I am headed for the water, since—unlike a bird—I have no way to fly back up into the sky. But the lived motility in which kinaesthetic consciousness holds sway is more typically experienced as reversible: having turned my head to the left, I can turn it back to the right; having extended my hand, I can withdraw it; having gone in one direction, I can retrace my steps. Moreover, the lived movement can be not only reversed, but repeated, interrupted, and inhibited; for Husserl, even “holding still” is a dynamic event, since it involves ongoingly maintaining a certain kinaesthetic “constellation” or “situation.”

b. Kinaesthetic Capabilities and Perceptual Appearances

Such descriptions retrieve kinaesthetic functioning from its anonymity, but remain abstract as long as its constitutive role is not specified more precisely. For example, enacting certain kinaesthetic possibilities brings certain correlative perceptual appearances to givenness in a concordant, regulated, non-arbitrary manner. “From here” I can see “this side” of the house, but this side already promises more, a situation for which Husserl uses the technical terms “inner horizon” and “outer horizon.” The current appearance of this side points to an inner horizon of possible future perceptions in which this very same side would itself be more fully given—for instance, if I were to move closer, then it could be touched as well as seen, or what is currently seen indistinctly could be seen in more detail, and so on. But “this” side of the building also points to an outer horizon of possible future perceptions of other “sides,” as well as further features of the surroundings, including currently unseen sides of other objects in the background, and so on.

Here what is important is not merely that Husserl’s account of perception emphasizes a correlation between, on the one hand, an embodied perceiver functioning as a center of orientation and, on the other hand, the perspectivity that is the invariable mode of givenness of perceived things in space; rather, what is at stake is a coherent, explorable, transcendent, open world. In other words, it is not merely that I see things from my own standpoint: it is that my own motility is the subjective correlate both of the world’s open explorability—its transcendence “beyond” the aspect of it given at any moment—and of its concordant coherence, since if I enact the appropriate kinaesthetic sequences, then what is currently “emptily” predelineated can be “fulfilled” in itself-givenness of the anticipated side or feature concerned (or can be “disappointed” and corrected instead). For example, I see a “corner” of the house; inseparable from the experience of this as a “corner” is that there is “more” to the house to be seen “around the corner” (even if this “more” is as yet indeterminate), and “if” I move there, “then” I will see precisely this “more,” determine its features in more detail, and so forth (or perhaps discover that all that is left of the building is a facade). However, the “if-then” relation that is at stake here is not a causal one, since the correlations in question pertain to the ordered structure of experience purely as experienced, not to real relations between physical entities considered in the naturalistic attitude (an attitude that we are, of course, free to take up if we wish).

Within the phenomenological attitude, in other words, the point is not to establish causal relations between “turning my head to the left” and “seeing a birdbath”; instead, the horizon of freedom pertaining to kinaesthetic consciousness opens ordered fields of display that can be seamlessly expanded as I move, so that turning my head to the left allows the corresponding further stretch of the visible world to come into view, whatever there may in fact be for me to see in any given situation or on any given occasion. And the same fundamental correlation between kinaesthetic capabilities and coherent fields of spatial display holds good for movement in any direction, as well as for the intersensorial world. Thus the description identifies an essential structure of experience per se, rather than offering a causal explanation of a particular empirical/factual event. Moreover, it turns out that Husserl’s analyses are not confined to the kinaesthetic circumstances swung into play in experiencing individual transcendent things “in” space, but demonstrate that kinaesthetic consciousness is itself space-constituting. (Early extensive analyses are found in the 1907 lectures published in Thing and Space, but Husserl refined his account throughout his life.) This, then, is another example of a Husserlian critique of presuppositions: he does not naively assume “space” as a pregiven framework for embodied perception and action (for example, as some kind of ready-made “container”), but devotes many pages to the experiential evidence that is at stake in the givenness of various types or levels of “space,” including not only the most immediate, “preobjective” space, but the infinite and homogeneous space of the natural sciences.

c. Kinaesthetic Experience and the Experience of Others

At this point, a second set of analyses come into play, for it is a feature of lived embodiment that I cannot jump out of my own skin and walk around myself in order to survey myself from all sides: the seeing consciousness is always at the center of orientation, and although I may be able to see parts of myself from various angles, I cannot see myself as a whole, as a figure on a ground or as an object “over there” from which I could definitively move away. Instead, I function as the uncancellably abiding “here” from which space-perception invariably proceeds. This means, however, that my “solo” experience of situated motility leaves me with a “hole” in space wherever I go—a mobile but non-surveyable center around which the rest of the panorama unfolds. The constitution of a genuinely homogeneous, objective, three-dimensional space requires the contribution of others, for whom I myself am indeed “over there,” inhabiting one among many possible “there’s.” Thus space-constitution is tied up with the Husserlian theme of intersubjectivity, which is also a key motif in his phenomenology of embodiment. Although Husserl gives various accounts of intersubjectivity, the present article pulls together some pieces of the puzzle that depend directly on his work with kinaesthetic consciousness. Note, however, that this account is not a linear account of discrete “steps” to be carried out, as though we began our existence utterly alone and only gradually discovered fellow living beings; rather, the explication furnishes a kind of “exploded diagram” of certain structural moments involved in the lived experience of recognizing embodied others—here construed broadly enough to encompass non-human as well as human cases. (Thus in the technical language of phenomenology, the “exploded diagram” account is “static,” rather than providing a “genetic” description of the origin and development of a certain type of experience as an abiding acquisition.)

For Husserl, a double dimension of “localization” of kinaestheses comes into play in this regard (always recalling that here the term “kinaesthetic” refers to motility per se, to the sheer “I can”/“I could” rather than to specific sorts of “sense data”). First of all, it is possible for at least some enactments of my own directly experienced motility to be co-given to me in the form of something perceivable in the same way as things of the world are. Thus, for example, not only can I move my own limbs, but—within limits—I can see them as moving objects in the same field of vision where other spatial things are given: subjective motility is “localized” in objectively appearing movements displaying certain distinctive styles of movement and modes of relating to the surrounding world (think, for example, of my own active/responsive hands being visible to me as I reach for an object and grasp it). Similarly, the kinaesthetic experience of speaking, singing, or crying out is paired with sounds appearing in the same audial field in which other sounds are given. (Although what I am providing here is, as I have indicated, a structural explication of intersubjectivity rather than a genetic-developmental account, it should be pointed out that in one brief passage on the mother-child relationship, Husserl emphasizes the child linking his/her own kinaesthetic capability for vocalization with certain heard sounds in the audial sphere in general—and then hearing sounds resembling these in certain respects, but without simultaneously experiencing the relevant kinaestheses, so that this contrast mediates the emerging own/other distinction.) But at the same time, enacting this or that kinaesthetic possibility (or constellation of possibilities) from the total kinaesthetic horizon yields yet another “if-then” order, above and beyond the coherent correlations discussed above whereby kinaesthetic circumstances motivate corresponding perceptual appearances. For “if” I move in a certain way, “then” even without touching myself, I can experience correlative somaesthetic sensations or sensings (Empfindnisse): kinaesthetic enactments are “localized” in corresponding patterns of felt embodiment (for instance, experiences of straining or releasing) through which my own lived body is concretely, sensuously present for me (whether marginally, as when I am immersed in something I am reading, or thematically—think, for example, of how it feels to stretch luxuriously).

To put it another way, the “mineness” of my own act of moving is linked with the “mineness” of the accompanying somaesthetic sensations, as well as with recognizable styles of externally perceivable movement. When I perceive movement in such a style, then, but without the correlative kinaesthetic consciousness (the tacit or explicit “I move”) and its accompanying patterns of felt somaesthetic localization, I experience (via what Husserl terms “passive syntheses of association”—which, however, must not be confused with “associationistic” psychological theories) another subjectivity who, like me, is a subject of both action and affection, both agency and ownership, both doing and undergoing. Thus it is not necessary to see another body that looks the same as mine in the sense of being roughly the same size, shape, and color in order to motivate the experience of recognizing the other’s subjectivity—in fact, the view of myself “from the outside” that this would require is precisely something that I can never fully have: it is a possibility that is itself motivated from the experience of the other as having his/her own point of view on me, and thus cannot serve to motivate my recognition of the other as another subjectivity in the first place. Instead, what I experience when I see the other stands at a higher degree of universality: I see a style of movement associated with certain eidetic features proper to sentient/sensitive motility per se, namely, kinaesthetic capability and somaesthetic sensibility. But exactly because these invariants are open to exemplification in so many ways, they provide the foundation for the lived experience of difference-from-the-other as well as that of similarity-with-the-other, since they are the very identity that permits the experience of “difference” here at all.

I do not, in other words, recognize others because I see them as reiterations of myself in my concrete embodiment; the I-other pairing does not consist of a model and a replica, but of two mutually contrasting variations of “embodiment per se,” only one of which I have genuinely original access to (when I pick up the heavy stone, I experience both my own effort and the stone’s resistance firsthand; seeing the other struggle with the stone, I may understand the degree of effort involved and realize that I am the stronger of the two of us, but I do not experience the other’s effort in the same direct way I experience my own, nor do I directly experience the other’s pain if the stone slips and lands on the other’s toe). Thus the other active, sentient, sensitive, relational body is not some sort of duplicate of my own body, but precisely “a” lived body lived from an experiential standpoint I myself can never inhabit, a “here” that is truly transcendent to my own precisely because I inevitably experience it as a “there” in paired contrast to my own “here.”

d. Further Philosophical Issues

So far, I have sketched out how embodiment understood as kinaesthetic consciousness functions in Husserl’s philosophical accounts of the transcendent spatial world and transcendent fellow subjectivities. Here it is not possible to flesh out these accounts in any more detail, although it can be said that for Husserl, our very openness to the world essentially involves a kinaesthetic engagement with what is most immediately, sensuously given in such a way that the genetic origins of transcendental logic itself can be traced back to these kinaesthetic capabilities and performances and their correlative sensuous “givens” (see Husserliana 11), matters he thematizes under the title of “transcendental aesthetics” (although he takes this term in a different sense than Kant’s). However, a further step must at least be touched on, one that draws upon yet another important distinction—that between the transcendental and the mundane. Husserl’s analyses of kinaesthetic consciousness assume a transcendental attitude, yet in the natural attitude, the body is—as we have seen—“obviously” a mundane reality, a part of the world. Although his earlier efforts were geared toward clarifying the philosophical foundations of the sciences that study such a reality, some of his later writings (see, for example, Husserliana 15, 282–328, 648–57) are framed as an inquiry into the experiential achievements whereby transcendental consciousness “mundanizes” itself in the first place (that is, takes itself as part of the world), even prior to “naturalizing” itself in psychophysical terms. Without going into detail about his approach to the problem (which is also known as the paradox of subjectivity—how can the very consciousness that constitutes the world simultaneously be a part of this world?), it should be emphasized that for Husserl, what is at stake is ultimately not at all how a “disembodied” consciousness could somehow acquire a “body.” Instead, after demonstrating that kinaesthetic capability is an essential structural moment of transcendental subjectivity itself, he asks how kinaesthetic consciousness as an ongoing flow of purely experiential potentialities (the possibilities of primal motility per se), and of ever-changing actualizations of these possibilities, can come to count as a mundane entity apprehended as one thing among others in the world (and here Husserl’s descriptions of the lived experience of “resistance” offer important clues). In any case, however, the Husserlian critique of presuppositions concerning the body leads to something like the possibility of transcendental corporeality—a notion that places many aspects of the Western philosophical tradition itself into question.

6. Conclusion

Recognizing the tension between the transcendental experience of embodiment as kinaesthetic consciousness (or indeed, of “consciousness” or “subjectivity” as kinaesthetic) on the one hand and the mundane experience of the body as a material, psychophysical reality on the other can now allow us to summarize two of Husserl’s most important contributions to a phenomenology of embodiment (above and beyond his pioneering descriptions of essential features of bodily subjectivity). First, taken transcendentally, embodiment is not something accomplished once and for all, but is—to borrow a telling phrase from Zaner’s The Problem of Embodiment (1964)—“a continuously on-going act”: at every moment (even during periods of relative quiescence), I am involved in a dynamic process of “embodying” that is carried out through the current actualization of my own kinaesthetic capabilities, with certain possibilities rather than others being actualized in this or that way. This is the case whether the particular kinaestheses swung into play at any given moment arise from instinctual strivings, involuntary adjustments, acquired habits, or volitionally directed free movement, and whether these patterns of kinaesthetic actualization are going completely unnoticed; are marginally present for me; are experientially prominent due to difficulty or discomfort; or are consciously appreciated in lucid awareness “from within” (note that these two sets of possibilities—one having to do with volition, the other with awareness—can intersect in a number of ways). Second, that I can apprehend myself as a “psychophysical unity” is not simply something to be naively accepted, but something to be clarified as a historical achievement whereby embodied experience is localized in a mundane object, “the body,” as one item among others in a world of material, natural realities. Thus within the natural attitude, “embodiment” winds up signifying the external expression of the inwardness always already essentially pertaining to “bodies” insofar as they are lived bodies (as opposed to mere physical things). And indeed, experiential evidence for the latter sense of “embodiment” is readily available in everyday life in our times—we immediately encounter one another as embodied persons, not as machines that we suspect or conclude must harbor minds. However, experiencing myself as an ongoing realization of my own kinaesthetic capabilities taken not “psychophysically,” but sheerly experientially (which deactivates, rather than presupposing, mind-body dualism) requires shifting from the mundane to the transcendental attitude (in Husserl’s sense of the term “transcendental”), although once this insight has been historically achieved, it too, like the achievements of naturalism, can “flow back into” everyday experience.

In the end, then, whether he is providing a phenomenological genealogy of the “psychophysical” or offering an alternative account of embodiment in terms of “kinaesthetic consciousness,” Husserl provides a powerful critique of Cartesian dualism. Nevertheless, his own interests are basically epistemological in character: the accent lies not on claims about what the body really “is,” but on the epistemic contribution of embodiment itself to our knowledge of the world in the first place (as well as on the legitimacy of the foundations of our knowledge of such matters). And as in all of his phenomenological work, Husserl does not merely “hold a position” and offer arguments to support it, but consistently and rigorously takes the ultimate court of appeal to be the experiential evidence pertaining to the phenomena themselves—evidence that continually outruns our inherited terms and concepts and requires us to place them in question.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Husserl, Edmund. Ding und Raum. Vorlesungen 1907. Ed. Ulrich Claesges. Husserliana 16. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973; Thing and Space: Lectures of 1907. Trans. Richard Rojcewicz. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1997, Sections IV–VI (129–245).
Husserl, Edmund. Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Zweites Buch. Phänomenologische Untersuchungen zur Konstitution [1912]. Ed. Marly Biemel. Husserliana 4. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1952; Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. Second Book. Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution. Trans. Richard Rojcewicz and André Schuwer. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1989, especially §§18a–b (60–70), §§36–42 (152–69), §§59–60a (266–77), et passim.
Husserl, Edmund. Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Drittes Buch. Die Phänomenologie und die Fundamente der Wissenschaften [1912]. Ed. Marly Biemel. Husserliana 5. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1952; Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. Third Book. Phenomenology and the Foundations of the Sciences. Trans. Ted E. Klein and William E. Pohl. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1980, §2 (4–9); Supplement I, §4 (103–12).
Husserl, Edmund. Analysen zur passiven Synthesis. Aus Vorlesungs- und Forschungsmanuskripten 1918–1926. Ed. Margot Fleischer. Husserliana 11. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1966; Analyses Concerning Passive and Active Synthesis: Lectures on Transcendental Logic. Trans. Anthony J. Steinbock. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001, §3 (47–53); “Perception and its Process of Self-Giving,” §2 (581–88); Appendix 25 (534–36).
Husserl, Edmund. Phänomenologische Psychologie. Vorlesungen Sommersemester 1925. Ed. Walter Biemel. Husserliana 9. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1962, Beilage VIII (“Die somatologische Struktur der objektiven Welt,” 390–95, not translated);Phenomenological Psychology: Lectures, Summer Semester, 1925. Trans. John Scanlon. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1977, §15 (79–83), §21 (99–101), §39 (150–53).
Husserl, Edmund. Cartesianische Meditationen [1931] und Pariser Vorträge. Ed. Stephan Strasser. Husserliana 1. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1950; Cartesian Meditations: An Introduction to Phenomenology. Trans. Dorion Cairns. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1960, Fifth Meditation, especially §44 (92–99), §§51–56 (112–31).
Husserl, Edmund. Die Krisis der europäischen Wissenschaften und die transzendentale Phänomenologie. Eine Einleitung in die phänomenologische Philosophie [1936]. Ed. Walter Biemel. Husserliana 6. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1954; The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology: An Introduction to Phenomenological Philosophy. Trans. David Carr. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1970, §28 (103–11), §47 (161–64), §62 (215–19).
Husserl, Edmund. Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität. Texte aus dem Nachlass. Erster Teil: 1905–1920; Zweiter Teil: 1921–1928; Dritter Teil: 1929–1935. Ed. Iso Kern. Husserliana 13, 14, 15. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973, passim.
Husserl, Edmund. Transzendentaler Idealismus. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1908–1921). Ed. Robin D. Rollinger with Rochus Sowa. Husserliana 36. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2003, Text Nr. 7 (132–45), Text Nr. 9 (151–66).
Husserl, Edmund. Die Lebenswelt. Auslegungen der vorgegebenen Welt und ihrer Konstitution. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1916–1937). Ed. Rochus Sowa. Husserliana 39. Dordrecht: Springer, 2008, especially Part IX (603–672).

b. Secondary Sources

Behnke, Elizabeth A. “Edmund Husserl’s Contribution to Phenomenology of the Body in Ideas II” [1989]. Rpt. in Issues in Husserl’s “Ideas II.” Ed. Thomas Nenon and Lester Embree. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1996, 135–60; rev. in Phenomenology: Critical Concepts in Philosophy. Ed. Dermot Moran and Lester E. Embree with Tanja Staehler and Elizabeth A. Behnke. Volume 2. Phenomenology: Themes and Issues. London: Routledge, 2004, 235–64 [includes further references to work in this area].
Bernet, Rudolf, Iso Kern, and Eduard Marbach. Edmund Husserl. Darstellung seines Denkens [1989]. 2nd rev. ed. Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 1996; An Introduction to Husserlian Phenomenology. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1993, Chapter 4, §3 (“The Kinaesthetic Motivation in the Constitution of Thing and Space,” 130–40, 259–60); Chapter 5, §2 (“Our Experience of the Other,” 154–65, 261–62).
Claesges, Ulrich. Edmund Husserls Theorie der Raumkonstitution. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1964, Parts II and III (55–144) [includes significant citations on lived body and kinaesthetic consciousness from Husserl’s D manuscripts].
Depraz, Natalie. Lucidité du corps. De l’empirisme transcendantal en phénoménologie. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
Dodd, James. Idealism and Corporeity: An Essay on the Problem of the Body in Husserl’s Phenomenology. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1997.
Mohanty, J. N. “Intentionality and the Mind/Body Problem.” In Organism, Medicine, and Metaphysics: Essays in Honor of Hans Jonas. Ed. Stuart F. Spicker. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1978, 283–300; rpt. in his The Possibility of Transcendental Philosophy. Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff, 1985, 121–38; rpt. in Phenomenology: Critical Concepts in Philosophy. Ed. Dermot Moran and Lester E. Embree with Tanja Staehler and Elizabeth A. Behnke. Volume 2. Phenomenology: Themes and Issues. London: Routledge, 2004, 316–32.
Sawicki, Marianne. Body, Text, and Science: The Literacy of Investigative Practices and the Phenomenology of Edith Stein. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1997, Chapter 2, D (“Nature and Intellect in Ideen II,” 73–89); Chapter 4, B, 1 (“Stein’s work for Husserl,” 153–65).
Seebohm, Thomas M. Hermeneutics: Method and Methodology. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2004, §12 (“The givenness of the other living body and animal understanding,” 98–105).
Spiegelberg, Herbert. “On the Motility of the Ego.” In Conditio Humana: Erwin W. Straus on his 75th birthday. Ed. Walter von Baeyer and Richard M. Griffith. Berlin: Springer-Verlag, 1966, 289–306; rpt., with Postscript 1978, in Spiegelberg, Steppingstones toward an Ethics for Fellow Existers: Essays 1944–1983. Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff, 1986, 65–86; rpt. in Phenomenology: Critical Concepts in Philosophy. Ed. Dermot Moran and Lester E. Embree with Tanja Staehler and Elizabeth A. Behnke. Volume 2. Phenomenology: Themes and Issues. London: Routledge, 2004, 217–34.
Ströker, Elisabeth. Philosophische Untersuchungen zum Raum. Frankfurt am Main: Vittorio Klostermann, 1965; Investigations in Philosophy of Space. Trans. Algis Mickunas. Athens, OH: Ohio University Press, 1987, Part One (“Lived Space,” 13–172).
Zahavi, Dan. “Husserl’s Phenomenology of the Body.” Études Phénoménologiques No. 19 (1994), 63–84.
Zaner, Richard M. The Problem of Embodiment: Some Contributions to a Phenomenology of the Body. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1964, 249–61, 287–89.

Author Information

Elizabeth A. Behnke
Email: sppb@openaccess.org
U. S. A.

American Transcendentalism

American transcendentalism is essentially a kind of practice by which the world of facts and the categories of common sense are temporarily exchanged for the world of ideas and the categories of imagination. The point of this exchange is to make life better by lifting us above the conflicts and struggles that weigh on our souls. As these chains fall away, our souls rise to heightened experiences of freedom and union with the good. Emerson and Thoreau are the two most significant nineteenth century proponents of American transcendentalism.

Looking at the world through common sense categories, such as time, space, and causation, yields hard and fast limits that can hurt us. Causation seems to make certain outcomes unavoidable whether we like them or not. Space separates us from the ones we love and the places we would rather be. Not to be outdone, time brings all good things to an end and converts the living into the dead. The categories of imagination free us from these detestable limits. We can imagine a world in which physical space is no more than an idea, enabling us to move from place to place at the speed of our thoughts. Emanation and fulguration make congenial substitutes for causation, because they generate only what is true, beautiful, and good. Not even time presents a problem for imagination, since we can readily view all things from the standpoint of eternity.

Most philosophers start with theories, searching for ways in which to practice what they preach only if they are serious about their philosophies. The transcendentalists reversed this procedure. They began with practices and then attempted to establish them on solid theoretical foundations. Yet these practices all involved spurning certain facts in favor of ideas, leading them invariably to theories that are inconsistent and vague. Their honesty would not allow them to spurn all facts, so they were ever at work reshaping intractable facts to fit their theories or stretching the fabric of their views to cover uncooperative facts. Unwitting victims of their own scruples, they found themselves hating facts that did not fit the mold and being frustrated with theories they knew failed to capture all the facts.

The final victim was transcendentalism itself. Critics, eager to wield the sword of criticism, overlooked the life-enhancing practices at the core of transcendentalism, concentrating their efforts on the many chinks and thin plates in its theoretical armor. Their blades penetrated easily, and they quickly pronounced their victim hopelessly baffling. Even friendly critics felt obliged to begin their articles with the proviso that transcendentalism is not easily articulated.

The transcendentalists were suspended between imagination and common sense. If they had been consistent empiricists or materialists, their theories might have been securely founded on facts. Had they been fully fledged idealists or rationalists, their theories might have been firmly fixed on logical relations. In reality, they were neither consistent nor fully fledged theorists. Emerson complained of a see-saw in his voice. Yet what is most valuable in the legacy of transcendentalism is not theoretical and is not in need of theoretical backing. It is the practices by which the transcendentalists managed, at least occasionally, to re-make the world in the image of what they loved.

Emerson and His Practices
German Influence
British Influence
Idealism
Morality
Beauty
Contemporary Relevance
References and Further Reading

1. Emerson and His Practices

Although he denied he was a transcendentalist, Ralph Waldo Emerson (1803-1882) was rightly viewed by his peers and is rightly viewed by contemporary scholars as the primary philosophical exponent of American transcendentalism, followed by Henry David Thoreau (1817-1862). Emerson distinguished at least three practices by which facts may be exchanged for ideas. The first enacts a form of idealism. Instead of seeing the world as an independent power that may lay waste to our purposes and plans, we can view it as a display of images or pictures created by us, rendering it harmless and even benevolent. Secondly, we can focus on moral actions and rejoice in their goodness. The third practice distinguished by Emerson is perhaps the one for which transcendentalism is best known. It is that of contemplating beauty.

These practices come naturally to many of us. We many not connect them to Emerson, his contemporaries, or the period in American intellectual history─roughly between the publication of Emerson’s “Nature” in 1836 and Thoreau’s death in 1862─when transcendentalism flourished as a movement; but inasmuch as we seek to improve our lives by turning away from facts and embracing ideas, we are transcendentalists.

2. German Influence

Word of Kant’s transcendental idealism may have reached Emerson through Frederick Henry Hedge (1805-1890), a Unitarian minister who had studied in Germany and knew German philosophy in its native tongue. In 1836, Hedge, Emerson, and George Ripley (1802-1880) founded an informal group they called Hedge’s Club for the purpose of stimulating discussion of current topics in philosophy and theology. The group convened irregularly for about seven years and grew to include at least a dozen members. It became known as the Transcendental Club. These meetings provided ample opportunity for Hedge to share his knowledge of Kant’s transcendental philosophy with Emerson.

The heart of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason is the distinction he draws between the transcendental and the transcendent. The transcendental refers to the necessary conditions of the possibility of experience. Input from perception is grasped through twelve categories, space, time, and what he calls the transcendental unity of apperception. These are structures of mind, so without them experience would be impossible. In contrast, the transcendent is that which lies beyond the scope of experience and is therefore inaccessible to conceptual knowledge. In his Critique of Pure Reason, Kant rejects the classic arguments for the existence of God on the grounds that knowledge of the transcendent is impossible. Ironically, the transcendental structure of mind is necessarily incapable of providing knowledge of the transcendent.

But Kant followed the Critique of Pure Reason with the Critique of Practical Reason, in which he adds an important qualification to his original view that God is unknowable. The transcendent, he argues, is the very foundation of morality. If not for God, the wicked might go unpunished and the righteous unrewarded. We may not be able to have conceptual knowledge of the transcendent, but we are morally obligated to act as the transcendent in the form of the free and rational moral will.

Kant’s view of our relation to the transcendent underwent a second transformation in his third major work, the Critique of Judgment. There he reconsiders some of the classic arguments for God’s existence and opts for the teleological. Organic beings are purposive, he tells us, though we cannot glean what their purposes are. Their purposiveness consists in the fact that they and their parts are mutually supporting. The parts are means to the wholes, and the wholes are means to the parts. Two important conclusions fall out of this analysis. The first is that everything can be seen as beautiful, because all objects have form, which hints at a kind of purposiveness based on the internal complexity of objects. This purposiveness of form creates a universal disinterested satisfaction that is experienced as beauty. The second conclusion is that conceptual understanding of beauty is impossible for human beings.

Although they are very different philosophies, the influence of Kant’s transcendental idealism on American transcendentalism is easy to see. The philosophies are markedly different because the Americans did not preserve Kant’s distinction between the transcendent and the transcendental. This distinction provides the framework for Kant’s entire system as presented in the Critique of Pure Reason, but the transcendentalists were not interested in systems or the frameworks of systems. What attracted them to Kant’s philosophy was the sentiment behind his words. One look at the prevailing sentiment of American transcendentalism and Kant’s influence is unmistakable. The Americans eagerly joined him in celebrating the rightness of moral action, the beauty of the world, and the majesty of God. Kant’s influence also shows itself in the view of the nature of beauty embraced by the transcendentalists, namely that it surpasses all understanding.

3. British Influence

The word “transcendental” brings to mind Kant and the German philosophers he influenced, but German thinkers were not the only ones to leave their mark on American transcendentalism. Emerson was a great admirer of William Wordsworth and Samuel Taylor Coleridge, both of whom he met when he traveled to Europe in 1832. Their romanticism was intoxicating to him, and he seems to have passed some of that intoxication to his friend Thoreau. The British romantics shared the same love of beauty, morality, and God that animated both Kant and the American transcendentalists, but the romantics had developed a unique perspective on our relation to those realities. This perspective provided one of the central features of American transcendentalism.

The British romantics saw tremendous beauty and goodness in the world. At the same time, they saw that all of that goodness and beauty is flawed. Human beings often embody great virtues, but this is not always so. Sometimes their behavior is monstrous in its selfishness and cruelty. The sky, the meadow, and the rose are breathtakingly beautiful, but as time passes their beauty fades. This double vision of the romantics, although it did not betray any facts, nevertheless placed them in the uncomfortable position of both hating and loving the world.

To get out of their predicament, the romantics made a bold move. They set their sights on the perfect, which for them could exist only beyond the awful limits of the world. Yet they could not forget that they were, as flesh and blood, inextricably tied to those very limits. Nor could they forget that it was those very limits that provided the precious glimpses of beauty and goodness, however degraded, that they cherished. This was a great tragedy, they decided, and it was made even greater by the fact that it was inevitable. If you live in this world and you have enough humanity to love the good and the beautiful, you will be constantly assailed by the pain of falling short of those ideals. Yet, they suggested, the more the tragedy of life appeared to us in all of its inevitability and pain, the more beautiful life would be in our eyes.

Had they embraced this perspective at face value, the transcendentalists might have been cheered. As a sequence of random events, some good and others bad, life is arguably meaningless and not worth living. But view it as a tragedy and life takes on a marvelous aesthetic unity. Anguish and tears become literary realities, beautiful in their significance and in the timeless moral lessons they convey. But the transcendentalists were too pragmatic to embrace such an intellectual view of life. The world was too much with them, and although they never tired of translating facts into ideas, they could not shake the sense that facts were somehow more real. Instead of cheering them up, their contact with romanticism ultimately saddened them. They fell in love with the perfect like good romantics, but they could find little beauty in the countless misfortunes that befell them. They felt betrayed by life. In Emerson, this feeling expressed itself in the form of sheer disbelief at the terrible things that happened to him. In Thoreau, it created a thin layer of bitterness and resentment that never dissipated.

The influence of the British romantics shaped American transcendentalism at least as much and probably more than that of Kant’s transcendental philosophy. Their influence contributed a longing for the perfect, one of the central features of transcendentalism in America. The other side of this contribution, equally central, was a treacherous undercurrent of disappointment and sadness.

4. Idealism

The idealism of the American transcendentalists, like their morality and their love of beauty, took the form of practices before it became, as an afterthought, a sort of theory. Emerson stood with his head between his legs and took note of the fact that this opened a very different reality. His long country rambles produced in him a profound feeling of the lawfulness and rationality of nature. The passions that stirred in his breast often burst forth in the form of an essay or a poem. Looking at the world from different angles, delighting in the patterns nature manifests, and writing poetry or prose are idealistic practices in the sense that they give consciousness a kind of priority. In creating new experiences or ideas, we seem to create new worlds, and mind takes on a status close to that of a divinity. The old familiar facts, when filtered through the categories of imagination, are given an almost miraculous appearance. We are free from their tedious and often sorrowful limits to roam at liberty in thought.

For the transcendentalists, this freedom was almost always short-lived. This is because they felt they should ground their idealistic practices in a consistent theory. The freedom and satisfaction their practices provided, they reasoned, would be more secure if given an adequate theoretical backing. Their reasoning may have been sound, but their attempt to ground their practices in an adequate theory had the opposite effect. They became tangled in theoretical problems that proved intractable, and this made engaging with ideas for the sake of the activity itself more difficult. An ulterior motive for this engagement was always pressing on them. The ideas could not be fully trusted unless somehow it could be shown that they captured the inner nature of things.

But the main idea implied by the transcendentalists’ practices, that all existence must conform to consciousness, was verified by their experience only occasionally. There were flashes of verification, as when Emerson dreamed he ate the world, but all too often it was consciousness that had to give way to the cold facts of existence. The loss of his beloved wife Ellen Tucker, his cherished son Waldo, and his dear friend Thoreau signaled to Emerson that something alien to mind was at work in the world.

What this alien something might be, the transcendentalists had no clear idea. Their idealism gave consciousness, rational principles, and human values the status of omnipotent governing powers. Evil was that for which there would be compensation, or it was an instrument necessary for the creation of a good far greater than any that would have been possible without its use. It was, in short, thoroughly intelligible, just, and even benevolent: a low mood or a contradictory thought passing through the Oversoul for the sake of its ultimate enrichment. Evil is good, or rather it has to be good if one takes the idealism of the transcendentalists at face value. Not even they were capable of doing this all the time, yet they had no means of understanding evil except through the lens of their idealism, nor would they have been comfortable viewing it through a different lens as a brute fact or an irrational power.

The only option for the transcendentalists was to live with one more evil, namely the fact that evil positively confounded their attempts to explain it. This made the evils they suffered that much worse, adding avoidable surprise and puzzlement to unavoidable pain. Had they been content to practice their idealism without attempting to expound it, they might have saved themselves considerable grief. Their idealistic practices alone do not give mind the kind of priority proper to a power, but they do give it a sort of valuational priority. In lavishly applying the categories of imagination to the world and marveling at the results, we affirm the priority of consciousness and its products in the sense of loving them the most. As long as this does not lead us to the tenuous theory that all existence must submit to mind, we are free to understand evil through the categories of common sense, as a rogue power that goes against our purposes and often overwhelms them. This does not translate evil into good, but it at least removes the sting of surprise and confusion when evil strikes.

5. Morality

Emerson was often accused of being a reluctant reformer, and behind those accusations there was a kernel of truth. His contemporaries in the United States and Europe were hungry for moral progress, and they wasted no time putting shoulder to wheel for their favorite causes. Emerson was different in that his temperament inclined him to be first a scholar. The purpose of scholars, he said, is to nurture the good in others; but what makes a scholar is the ability to see the larger picture of things, and for this a certain distance from the heat of action is required. Emerson was by nature a visionary and a poet, not a man of action. No matter how much he sympathized with the ideals to which reformers aspired, he could not engage in actual reform without some initial discomfort. It was not what he was born to do.

Yet Emerson’s accusers failed to see the full reality of the accused. He may have hesitated before throwing his weight behind a cause for fear of losing the reflective distance he naturally valued; but if the cause was just he almost always ended up fighting for it. When the government of the United States announced plans to force Cherokees from their native lands, Emerson wrote President Van Buren in protest. The reflective but deeply moral Emerson opposed slavery openly both in writing and in public lectures. Inspired by his friend Margaret Fuller, Emerson supported the burgeoning women’s rights movement, becoming Vice President of the New England Women’s Suffrage Association in 1869. It is ironic that for all the accusations of reluctance made against him by his peers, today’s scholars tend to view Emerson as one of the nineteenth century’s most important reformers.

Emerson’s reflective temperament made him skeptical of reform movements, which seemed to him to be driven by narrow and hasty views. At the same time, he was convinced that it is not the group but the individual that is the ultimate agent of moral progress. He admired and celebrated the moral actions of principled individuals and was often spurred by them to act in spite of his temperament. This is transcendentalism at its moral best. Moral action is not governed or called forth by a theory; it is a spontaneous response to the feeling of one’s individual potentiality combined with one’s natural love of the good. Assuming the good is not conceived narrowly, as it almost never was by Emerson, this kind of morality is less problematic than many others. Emerson was lead by it to some of his most important contributions to the reform movements of his day.

Again, the problem came when the transcendentalists attempted to ground their spontaneous practices in a theory that lodged their values in the nature of things. Emerson said many times that nature itself is the supreme model and ultimate ground of morality, since it is a manifestation of timeless moral laws. All evil is a form of instruction, pointing the way to better lives and a better world. No doubt Emerson embraced this view wholeheartedly, but its implications for specific evils that visited him created turmoil in his soul. He could not hide from himself the fact that some evils seemed to lack pedagogical value. It was hardly possible for him to view the death of his five year old son as instruction for the improvement of life. Nor was he easily able to see the fire that consumed his home as a lesson in how to make the world a better place. Their view of the world as inherently moral, like the idealism they attempted to develop, created for the transcendentalists a painful rift between the theory they thought they should live by and the actual events, actions, and emotions that filled their lives.

This was less so, at least as regards morality, for Thoreau. Emerson’s greatest student was less committed than his mentor to the view that nature is intrinsically moral. Thoreau, moreover, was more practical than Emerson in moral matters. He perceived with greater clarity the fact that institutions exist because of the free actions of individuals. If individual slaveholders decided to stop holding slaves, slavery would gradually be destroyed. Nor did Thoreau confuse this practical insight with Emerson’s more theoretical position that individuals are the ultimate moral agents because they have access, through reason and contemplation, to the moral laws inherent in nature.

While Emerson’s love of reflection often slowed his response time, Thoreau tended to react to moral problems quickly and decisively. He immediately urged those around him to examine their consciences and change their behaviors accordingly. Thoreau’s letter in support of John Brown, a controversial abolitionist convicted of treason, captures this pragmatic approach to morality. The letter is full of motivational rhetoric. Advancing the cause of abolition, Thoreau seems to have reasoned, was simply a matter of convincing enough individuals to oppose Brown’s conviction.

In their morality, the transcendentalists did not abandon their practice of exchanging facts and the categories of common sense for ideas and the categories of imagination. Nor did they lose all awareness of common sense or all contact with facts. This combination of circumstances might have propelled them to dizzying heights of theorizing in an attempt to reconcile the two poles of their vision, as it often did in relation to their idealism. But on the whole, not counting the theoretical flights in which Emerson argued for a moral structure of the world, the transcendentalists were more down to earth about morality than they were about metaphysics. Not only did they tend to avoid too much theorizing, they took their practice a step further. Having seen and appreciated a vision of how things ought to be, they went to work to improve the relevant facts in light of their ideas. In a word, the transcendentalists were meliorists.

6. Beauty

If there is a single practice with which American transcendentalism can be identified, it is contemplation of beauty. Emerson responded to Plato’s theory that beauty, truth, and goodness are one by saying that even so beauty is the best of the three. Children seem to see it radiating from the most ordinary objects to their exquisite delight. Adults sometimes find themselves feeling like children again in its presence. The transcendentalists thought of beauty as eternal, because a mere glimpse of it was enough to make them drop everything and simply take in what they heard or saw with neither motive nor intention. This activity satisfied them so deeply that while they were thus engaged it was as if time stood still.

Perhaps the most famous experience of beauty described by Emerson is the one in which he became a “transparent eyeball.” Alone in the woods, “head bathed by the blithe air, and uplifted into infinite space”, he found that he had vanished from his own experience. It was as if he consisted of nothing but impersonal vision, the object of which was “unconstrained and immortal beauty.” Thoreau was equally susceptible to such enthralling experiences of beauty. Snow drifts, the shapes and colors of leaves, and the way light falls revealed to him so much beauty that he thought of them as imprints of the divine.

Of the three practices distinguished by Emerson, contemplation of beauty is perhaps the one that came most naturally to the transcendentalists. They were ready, like Socrates, for beauty to give them wings on which they could ascend to heaven and see reality from the standpoint of the gods. Facts, with all of their hard edges, quickly melted into images or ideas under beauty’s divine influence. The contemplative absorptions this created were immensely satisfying, but they were also deceptive. Had the facts actually melted or did it merely seem as if they had?

Motivated by the tremendous appeal of the former hypothesis, Emerson attempted to extend the influence of beauty far beyond momentary absorptions. He reached the conclusion that everything is beautiful by arguing that beauty derives from purposiveness. Emerson thought of nature as a single, all-embracing system governed by immutable moral laws. In such a system, everything has a purpose in relation to the whole and is rendered beautiful by that relation. Marcus Aurelius proposed something similar in his Meditations. He said that even the foam at the mouths of ravening beasts takes on a certain beauty once its purpose is known.

The argument that purposiveness confers beauty is plausible when purposes are present and when they are at least arguably benevolent. A towering concrete dam may spoil the beauty of a river, until we understand that it was built to provide water to surrounding communities. Yet even though we see a benevolent purpose behind it, the ugliness of the dam may not be diminished. The argument is much weaker when applied to objects or events the purposes of which are evil, and it fails altogether in the case of realities that are non-purposive. Weapons of mass destruction are not rendered beautiful in light of their purpose. Earthquakes that strike major cities may occur for the sake of maintaining the structural equilibrium of the planet, but this adds little beauty to them. Moreover, nothing prevents us from understanding natural disasters as mechanical rather than purposive processes.

The transcendentalists were eminently capable of stretching their imaginations. When they exercised this capacity to the fullest, they saw around them an abstract world of interrelated ideas. The beauty of that world was so captivating that it tended to blind them to all external realities. Emerson went as far as to say there is a certain beauty in a corpse. We can hardly fault the transcendentalists for wishing to live always in the presence of the beautiful; yet the feats of imagination by which they conjured an ideal world could not be sustained forever. The transcendentalists were drawn to the beauty of ideas, but they knew they had to make their way in a world that also included stubborn facts. Once more we can see that it was not their practices, but their efforts to ground them in theories that created problems for the transcendentalists. Emerson’s attempt to demonstrate that all things are beautiful made ugliness a little uglier and a little sadder. Even worse, it made it confounding. When a homely or a grotesque fact intruded into the beautiful world of his ideas, he loathed it all the more because he could not make sense of the intrusion.

7. Contemporary Relevance

Theories that attempt to establish the inner nature of the world will always be interesting and instructive. They capture the imagination and, if we care to see, show us the limits of what we know. The transcendentalists never produced a complete theory. Producing one that placed their values at the core of reality would have required them to set aside their interest in action and their instinctive loyalty to facts. Instead, they theorized spontaneously in an attempt to shore up the practices that brought them closer to the good. The bits and pieces of theory they devised are of continuing relevance not because they capture corresponding portions of ultimate reality but because they show us the extent to which human beings are capable of loving all that is good in the world.

Although the transcendentalists did not succeed in grounding their practices in a fully developed theory of absolute reality, they did not need to succeed in this. Appreciating the marvelous creativity of consciousness, affirming moral action, and contemplating beauty are self-standing practices. One might explain them and the values they uphold equally well through a variety of theories, and many philosophers have developed complete systems that assign to beauty, morality, or consciousness the status of the real. The transcendentalists sought to secure their practices to theoretical foundations, but their practices are independent of all attempts to develop a satisfactory account of them. They do not need the support of theories as an airplane does not need wires to hold it in the air. Not only that, but the effort to ground practices in theories is fraught with frustration, since there are many plausible theories, and those that one dislikes must constantly be defended against. The life-long devotion of the transcendentalists to their practices, even as their theories changed and vexed them anew, suggests they sensed their practices would and perhaps should stand on their own.

It is hard to overstate the value of the practices that form the heart of transcendentalism. We tend to lose sight of the sheer improbability of awareness and the wonder of its products. The rightness of moral action does not always impress us, and we often fail to see beauty in ordinary objects and events. The focus on improvement instilled in many of us from childhood bogs us down in facts that demand accounting and predicting. We grow increasingly blind to the realm of imagination and possibilities. Consider what the world would be like if we practiced transcendentalism all the time. We would view consciousness as a wonder that is without equal in the universe. A single moral action either performed or witnessed would be cause for feeling good. Perhaps best of all, we would not miss even the smallest particle of beauty. A pattern, a color, a sparkle seen out of the corner of the eye would lift us above all dreary facts to the heights of contemplative joy. None of this would establish the good or the beautiful or even the true in the inner sanctum of reality, but it would enrich the reality that is our experience, and that is what the transcendentalists sought above all.

8. References and Further Reading

Emerson, R. W. Emerson’s Complete Works. 12 Vols. Boston: Houghton, Mifflin, and Company, 1883-93.
Emerson, R. W. Emerson in His Journals. Joel Porte, Ed. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1982.
Gougeon, L. Virtue’s Hero: Emerson, Antislavery, and Reform. Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1990.
Gray, H. D. Emerson: A Statement of New England Transcendentalism as Expressed in the Philosophy of its Chief Exponent. New York: Frederick Ungar, 1970.
McAleer, J. J. Ralph Waldo Emerson: Days of Encounter. Boston: Little, Brown, and Company, 1984.
Packer, B. L. The Transcendentalists. Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 2007.
Richardson, R. D. Henry Thoreau: A Life of the Mind. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1986.
Thoreau, H. D. The Best of Thoreau’s Journals. Carl Bode, Ed. Carbondale, IL: Southern Illinois University Press, 1971.
Thoreau, H. D. Walden. Michael Meyer, Ed. London: Macmillan, 1995.
Thoreau, H. D. A Week on the Concord and Merrimack Rivers. Carl Hovde, Ed. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1980.
Myerson, Joel, Ed. Transcendentalism: A Reader. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.

Author Information

Michael Brodrick
Email: michael.brodrick@gmail.com
Indiana University Purdue University Indianapolis
U. S. A.

Edmund Husserl (1859—1938)

Husserl Although not the first to coin the term, it is uncontroversial to suggest that the German philosopher, Edmund Husserl (1859-1938), is the “father” of the philosophical movement known as phenomenology. Phenomenology can be roughly described as the sustained attempt to describe experiences (and the “things themselves”) without metaphysical and theoretical speculations. Husserl suggested that only by suspending or bracketing away the “natural attitude” could philosophy becomes its own distinctive and rigorous science, and he insisted that phenomenology is a science of consciousness rather than of empirical things. Indeed, in Husserl’s hands phenomenology began as a critique of both psychologism and naturalism. Naturalism is the thesis that everything belongs to the world of nature and can be studied by the methods appropriate to studying that world (that is, the methods of the hard sciences). Husserl argued that the study of consciousness must actually be very different from the study of nature. For him, phenomenology does not proceed from the collection of large amounts of data and to a general theory beyond the data itself, as in the scientific method of induction. Rather, it aims to look at particular examples without theoretical presuppositions (such as the phenomena of intentionality, of love, of two hands touching each other, and so forth), before then discerning what is essential and necessary to these experiences. Although all of the key, subsequent phenomenologists (Heidegger, Sartre, Merleau-Ponty, Gadamer, Levinas, Derrida) have contested aspects of Husserl’s characterization of phenomenology, they have nonetheless been heavily indebted to him. As such, he is arguably one of the most important and influential philosophers of the twentieth century. The key features of his work, and his understanding of the phenomenological method, are considered in what follows.

Biography
How to Interpret Husserl’s Texts
On the Concept of Number (Übert den Begriff der Zahl, 1887)
Logical Investigations (Logische Untersuchungen, 1900-01)
Ideas I (Ideen I, 1913)
Ideas II (Ideen II)
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Edmund Husserl was born April 8, 1859, into a Jewish family in the town of Prossnitz in Moravia, then a part of the Austrian Empire. Although there was a Jewish technical school in the town, Edmund’s father, a clothing merchant, had the means and the inclination to send the boy away to Vienna at the age of 10 to begin his German classical education in the Realgymnasium of the capital. A year later, in 1870, Edmund transferred to the Staatsgymnasium in Olmütz, closer to home. He was remembered there as a mediocre student who nevertheless loved mathematics and science, “of blond and pale complexion, but of good appetite.” He graduated in 1876 and went to Leipzig for university studies.

At Leipzig Husserl studied mathematics, physics, and philosophy, and he was particularly intrigued with astronomy and optics. After two years he went to Berlin in 1878 for further studies in mathematics. He completed that work in Vienna, 1881-83, and received the doctorate with a dissertation on the theory of the calculus of variations. He was 24. Husserl briefly held an academic post in Berlin, then returned again to Vienna in 1884 and was able to attend Franz Brentano’s lectures in philosophy.

In 1886 he went to Halle, where he studied psychology and wrote his Habilitationsschrift on the concept of number. He also was baptized. The next year he became Privatdozent at Halle and married a woman from the Prossnitz Jewish community, Malvine Charlotte Steinschneider, who was baptized before the wedding. The couple had three children. They remained at Halle until 1901, and Husserl wrote his important early books there. The Habilitationsschrift was reworked into the first part of Philosophie der Arithmetik, published in 1891. The two volumes of Logische Untersuchungen came out in 1900 and 1901.

In 1901 Husserl joined the faculty at Göttingen, where he taught for 16 years and where he worked out the definitive formulations of his phenomenology that are presented in Ideen zu einer reinen Ph‰nomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie (Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy). The first volume of Ideen appeared in the first volume of Husserl’s Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung in 1913. Then the world war disrupted the circle of Husserl’s younger colleagues, and Wolfgang Husserl, his son, died at Verdun. Husserl observed a year of mourning and kept silence professionally during that time.

However Husserl accepted appointment in 1916 to a professorship at Freiburg im Breisgau, a position from which he would retire in 1928. At Freiburg Husserl continued to work on manuscripts that would be published after his death as volumes two and three of the Ideen, as well as on many other projects. His retirement from teaching in 1928 did not slow the pace of his phenomenological research. But his last years were saddened by the escalation of National Socialism’s racist policies against Jews. He died of pleurisy in 1938, on Good Friday, reportedly as a Christian.

Most commentators, therefore, recognize three periods in Husserl’s career: the work at Halle, Göttingen, and Freiburg, respectively. Some argue that one or another of these periods ought to be taken as definitive and used as the interpretive key to unlock the others. But such an approach highlights disjunctions in Husserl’s thought while neglecting the significant continuities. Important strands of Husserl’s philosophy have their beginning long before his academic career commenced.

The community into which Husserl was born, Prossnitz, was a center of talmudic learning whose yeshiva had produced or welcomed a number of famous rabbis during the two centuries before Husserl’s birth. This scholarly activity was supported by the industries of textile and clothing manufacture, through which Prossnitz’s Jews had enhanced the prosperity of the region. Jews and Germans were minorities in the town and appear to have comprised its middle class. Their interests were naturally allied against those of the Slavic majority. (For example, the census of 1900 counted 1,680 Jews among the town’s 24,000 inhabitants, according to The Jewish Encyclopedia.) In the ethnically diverse town, several dialects were spoken, and the language of the Husserl home probably was Yiddish.

The Jewish community of Prossnitz had established a technical school in 1843, and it became a public school for all the town’s children in 1869–one year before young Edmund Husserl was sent off to Vienna’s Realgymnasium. 1868 was also a year when civic authorities called for reform of Jewish education at all levels throughout Moravia. These developments reflect a movement toward modernization and integration after centuries of enforced segregation and legal restriction of Jewish life.

Prossnitz was the second-largest Jewish community in Moravia, with 328 families. Exactly 328 families; it could have no more, because of the quota established by the Bohemian Familianten Gesetz in 1787. The Jewish population was controlled through marriage licenses. Civil law set specific economic, age, and educational requirements; but in addition, the license could be granted only after a death freed up one of the allotted 328 slots. In effect, only first sons could hope to marry. Others had to emigrate if they wanted to have families of their own. This population-control policy was enforced until 1849, ten years before Edmund Husserl’s birth. The requirement that Jews obtain special marriage licenses remained in effect until late in 1859, some months after Edmund’s birth.

But Edmund Husserl’s childhood was spent during an era of liberalization for Prossnitz’s Jews. He received an elite secular education and probably made his father quite proud. At that period, gymnasia provided separate religious instruction for Christian boys and Jewish boys. Edmund’s Jewish education would have continued in that context and in the language of secular culture, High German. He could hear and read the Bible in that modern language as well, for in the nineteenth century a wave of new translations into the language of German culture was spawned by Moses Mendelssohn’s groundbreaking work. (Mendelssohn’s 1783 translation into High German was printed in Hebrew characters, phonetically, to make it easy to read.) Some of these editions were lavishly illustrated for display in bourgeois homes like Edmund’s, and most took into account the findings of recent historical and philological science. But during Edmund’s childhood, translating the Hebrew Bible was still a controversial issue. Some educational leaders in the Jewish community warned that it would undermine Hebrew learning among the young. Hebrew learning was evidently not prized by a father who would send his son to the capital to study Greek and Latin at the age when boys traditionally were sent down the street to learn Hebrew and Torah. To complicate the picture, in 1870 when Edmund was eleven, a new rabbi came to serve the Prossnitz community.

One may surmise, then, that Edmund Husserl came by his knowledge of the Bible through his classical secular education, not his religious tradition. It was of a piece with the German cultural heritage for him. It was a source of literary allusions, and in later life he could compare himself to Moses and to Sisyphus with equal ease.

Literary allusions, along with fragments of correspondence, are all that remain to us for the reconstruction of what Husserl may have felt about himself and his work. There is no autobiography per se. But there are retrospective texts. One of the most illuminating is the brief introduction that Husserl prepared for the 1931 publication in English of the first book of Ideen, originally brought out in 1913.

Now in his seventies, Husserl complains that most readers have misunderstood his life’s work. When he undertakes to reformulate what phenomenology is and what he has accomplished, however, he writes from a vantage point that he did not have some two decades earlier. Husserl becomes, in effect, a critic and interpreter of his own work, which he describes with a sustained metaphor. He portrays himself as an explorer who has opened the way into new territory so that others may conquer, map, and farm it. Of himself, Husserl writes:

“(H)e who for decades did not speculate about a new Atlantis but instead actually journeyed in the trackless wilderness of a new continent and undertook the virgin cultivation of some of its areas will not allow himself to be deterred in any way by the rejection of geographers who judge his reports according to their habitual ways of experiencing and thinking and thereby excuse themselves from the pain of undertaking travels in the new land” (422)

Here is another example of this characterization:

I can see spread out before me the endlessly open plains of true philosophy, the ‘promised land’, though its thorough cultivation will come after me” (429)

By means of this spatial, geographical metaphor of crossing over into the “new land,” Husserl conveys something of the adventure and pioneer courage that should accompany phenomenological work. This science is related to “a new field of experience, exclusively its own, the field of ‘transcendental subjectivity’,” and it offers “a method of access to the transcendental-phenomenological sphere” (408). Husserl is the “first explorer” (419) of this marvelous place.

2. How to Interpret Husserl’s Texts

Husserl had already employed the spatial metaphor in the 1913 text, although without explicit reference to himself as explorer. In chapter I-1 of Ideen I he had distinguished states of affairs (Sachverhaltnis) from essences (Wesen) by assigning them to two “spheres”: the factual or material, and the formal or eidetic, respectively. These spheres are connected only by the mind’s ability to pass between them as easily as moving around within either of them; they do not connect on their own, as it were. That is, no causality obtains between them. “Movement between” and “movement within” are of course further elaborations upon the spatial metaphor, and serve to designate the ability of consciousness to flow along, concentrate itself, linger, combine, focus, or disperse as it will. Such acts of consciousness belong to these spheres. They are worldly. They are “psychological.”

Husserl’s task is to get from those spheres into another “field” that is quite unlike them. It will be the sphere of absolute consciousness, consciousness when it isn’t going anywhere. As the title of chapter II-3 puts it, this will be “The Region of Pure Consciousness.” You can’t “go there” with consciousness; instead you have to let the worldly go away and then inhabit what’s left. This is the import of the infamous fantasy that opens paragraph 33: “(W)as kann als Sein noch setzbar sein, wenn das Weltall, das All der Realit‰t eingeklammert bleibt?” (In Kersten’s paraphrase: “What can remain, if the whole world, including ourselves with all our cogitare, is excluded?” [63])

Now, it’s quite curious that Husserl should choose the spatial metaphor to introduce and induce his phenomenological reduction. This metaphor invites confusion for anyone familiar with Descartes– who after all named spatial extension as the substantial attribute of material being. None of Husserl’s “spheres” is literally extended, in the Cartesian sense; yet all are coextensive (coincident) with material being–inasmuch as there’s literally nowhere else besides the material universe where they could be. Why then should Husserl choose such an incongruous and counterproductive metaphor? A different metaphor (such as “fabric” or “organism,” for example) could have conveyed the notions of coherence, separation, and access that Husserl intended. What is distinctive about the spatial metaphor, however, is that it connotes exploration and conquest. If transcendental consciousness is a promised land, then you need a Moses to lead you toward it. You need Husserl. When Husserl remarks, in the 1931 Introduction, that he can look down across that land that he has discovered, but that others will enter, this is a literary allusion to the figure of Moses, who led his people to Canaan, “the promised land,” but did not lead them into it (Deuteronomy 34).

If these allusions from 1931 can be taken as a thumbnail self- portrait, still one must remember that it was sketched during Husserl’s retirement. But Husserl’s thought grew and changed throughout his long career. In his maturity, the philosopher joined his readers in producing commentary upon his youthful work. The three phases of Husserl’s career–Halle, Göttingen, and Freiburg–invite facile divisions, and decisive turning points have been suggested within each of those periods. (The survival of nearly 45,000 pages of stenographic notes from Husserl’s teaching and his private researches has fueled disputes about when he might have had the first glimmer of a thought that led to a lecture comment that led to a paragraph that found its way into a book published long after the man’s papers and ashes were shelved in Louvain!)

Husserl himself insisted that the threads of continuity throughout the evolution of his thought were more significant than any false starts that later had to be repudiated. It seems well to grant him this point. Yet on two issues one must take seriously the critical discussion arising from disjunctions in Husserl’s thought: (a) the question whether to characterize Husserl as realist or idealist, and (b) the question of which stage of Husserl’s evolution–if any–should be taken as the definitive version through which all other versions are to be read. Husserl himself, writing as his own critic later in life, took a position on each of those issues. On (a), he insisted that he was and always had meant to be a transcendental idealist. On (b), he claimed competence to correct the insights of 1887, 1900, and 1913 with the insights of the 1920’s and 1930’s. Thus the mature Husserl would wish to erase the impression that his early work resolved the realism-idealism conundrum in favor of realism, and that it did so in fidelity to an insight already expressed in his earliest work on number.

Various punctuations of Husserl’s career by time, place, and predominant question have been suggested by commentators (for example, Kockelmans 1967: 17-23; Ricoeur 1967: 3-12; Biemel 1970; and Bell 1990). Husserl’s phenomenology developed gradually, but there were several relatively sudden turns and several stalls. Two examples suffice to illustrate. While at Halle shortly after the publication of Philosophie der Arithmetik, Husserl distanced himself from his recent efforts to establish mathematical and logical principles upon the psychological operations of the mind—a project that he later termed “psychologism.” Many commentators have characterized this as an abrupt turn made in response to Frege’s effective criticism of Philosophie der Arithmetik. However Mohanty (1982: 13), who examines the Frege-Husserl correspondence along with other documentary evidence, concludes to the contrary, that:

the seeds of development of Husserl’s philosophy from the Philosophie der Arithmetik to the Prolegomena [i.e., the first volume of the Logische Untersuchungen, 1900] were immanent to his own thinking, so that the hypothesis of a traumatic effect of Frege’s 1894 review of his book and a consequent reversal of his mode of thinking is not only uncalled for but also unsubstantiated by the available evidence.

Mohanty, then, provides ample warrant for a reading of Husserl that pursues threads of continuity between his early mathematical work and the breakthrough to phenomenology while at Halle.

In a second example of a supposed disjuncture in Husserl’s development, there has been discussion of whether he changed his stance from realism to idealism between Göttingen and Freiburg. On the one hand, Eugen Fink (1933) and many others see a consistent evolution of transcendental idealism from the work published in Ideen I onward. They tend either to dismiss the earlier works as if they were merely youthful failures, or forcibly to harmonize the realist passages with Husserl’s later positions. Husserl himself endorsed such a reading. On the other hand, those who studied with Husserl at Göttingen insist that his work at that time had validity and integrity in its own right. His former student Edith Stein (1932: 44-45) remarks that Husserl’s disciples were surprised at the idealistic passages in Ideen, and she calls Fink a latecomer to Husserl’s phenomenology. One of Stein’s contemporaries among Husserl students, Roman Ingarden (1962: 159), says that:

the idealistic tendencies apparent in volume I of the Ideen had been opposed by his disciples when the work was being studied during the seminars at Göttingen and . . . his disciples pointed out many passages in the Ideen which seemed to contain direct arguments against his idealism.

Subsequently Ingarden presented arguments, based on both the text of Logische Untersuchungen and his conversations with Husserl, in support of the view that Husserl originally espoused a realist standpoint but later abandoned it (Ingarden 1975: 4-8). Further discussion of the issue is to be found in Kockelmans (1967: 418-449) and in Van de Pitte (1981: 36-42)–who suggests that the discrepancy will vanish if one reads Husserl’s idealism as an epistemological or methodological approach to a metaphysically real world.

For his own part, Husserl (1931: 418-9) claimed that his transcendental idealism had advanced altogether beyond ordinary idealism, beyond realism, and beyond the very distinction between them. He denied that he ever had held a realist position:

. . . I still consider, as I did before, every form of the usual philosophical realism nonsensical in principle, no less so than that idealism which it sets itself up against in its arguments and which it “refutes.” [Phenomenological reduction] is a piece of pure self- reflection, exhibiting the most original evident facts; moreover, if it brings into view in them the outlines of idealism . .. it is still anything but a party to the usual debates bewteen idealism and realism. . . .

Husserl argued that transcendental-phenomenological idealism did not deny the actual existence of the real world, but sought instead to clarify the sense of this world (which everyone accepts) as actually existing.

Thus Husserl joins the company of those who read his work “backwards,” from the standpoint of Freiburg, interpreting the earliest work in light of the transcendental idealism of the latest. This reading grants no validity to the earlier work in its own right. It sets Husserl against Kant, and phenomenology’s thoroughgoing idealism against Kantian critical idealism. Fink, in his detailed response to neo- Kantians’ readings of Husserl’s phenomenology (1932), scolds them for even addressing arguments made in Husserl’s 1900-1 and 1913 publications–for Fink contends that those positions now must be assimilated to Husserl’s later formulations. The extreme hermeneutical implications of this stance come clear in Fink’s delineation of the threefold paradox entailed in reading Husserl’s phenomenology: (1) It is inevitably misunderstood if the reader has not first cultivated the transcendental attitude; yet that attitude arises from the reading. (2) The words necessarily miss their meaning, and fail to refer effectively to the pre-worldly realm of transcendental subjectivity, since all available words are worldly. (3) Phenomenology goes to a realm beyond logic, individuation, and determination, which ordinarily structure understanding. In this extreme form, then, the Freiburg reading of Husserl’s work is a locked door for the newcomer who is trying to get acquainted with Husserl’s phenomenology.

Fortunately, there are other hermeneutical options. A second group of commentators read Husserl “forward” from his intellectual beginnings at Vienna and Halle. The early work in mathematics and logic continues to attract the interest of Analytic philosophers. They are among those who argue that Husserl’s concern with numbers and logical reasoning, stimulated by the Kantian challenge, fructified in the prescription of eidetic and, eventually, phenomenological reductions.

Besides reading Husserl from Halle “forward” or from Freiburg “backward,” there is yet a third option. One may base one’s reading upon the Göttingen period and upon questions involving the genesis of the Ideen, as the keystone in the arch of Husserl’s development. This is the stance suggested by Ingarden, who considered Husserl’s later transcendentalism a big mistake, and by Stein, whose own subsequent works unfold the implications of the realism and personalism embraced by Husserl at that period. On this view the world, lost by Kant, is won back for science.

The problems of oneness and unity occupied Husserl throughout all the phases of his philosophical development: his earliest work on number and logic, his pre-war realist descriptive phenomenology, and his idealist transcendental phenomenology. His philosophy in some respects parallels the emergence of modern psychology, with whose tenets it should not be confused. The following are his major works.

3. On the Concept of Number (Übert den Begriff der Zahl, 1887)

Husserl’s Habilitationsschrift is subtitled “psychological analyses,” and it addresses the question how we recognize manyness within a group. Husserl remarks that the common definition of number–that number is a multiplicity of units–leaves two key questions unanswered: “What is ‘multiplicity’? And what is ‘unity’?” It is the former question, multiplicity, that occupies his attention throughout the essay. However the latter question, unity, haunts the discussion and refuses to be ignored.

Husserl locates the origin of multiplicity in the activity of combining, which he takes to be a psychological process. After much consideration he identifies this activity as synthesis, or the gathering of items into a set. He notices then that synthetic unities are of two kinds. Either the relationship through which the multiple items belong to the one set is a content of the mental representation of those items (right in there alongside them as another item that can be attended to and counted), or it is not there. In the former case, the unity is physical. Otherwise it is psychical, stemming from the unifying mental act that sets the contents into the relationship.

Having made that distinction between natural or physical unity, and arbitrary or imposed unity, Husserl then goes on to contrast these varieties of synthetic oneness with something else entirely: unsynthesized unity. His example is a rose, whose so-called parts are continuous and come apart only for the examining mind.

“In order to note the uniting relations in such a whole, analysis is necessary. If, for example, we are dealing with the representational whole which we call ‘a rose,’ we get at its various parts successively, by means of analysis: the leaves, the stem…. Each part is thrown into relief by a distinct act of noticing, and is steadily held together with those parts already segregated” (114).

Ironically, Husserl has struck gold while mining coal, and doesn’t quite recognize what he’s got hold of. His description of nonsynthesized unity comes almost as a byproduct of his attempt to differentiate physical or real collective combination from psychic combination. He writes:

“… these combining relations present themselves as, so to speak, a certain ‘more,’ in contrast to the mere totality, which appears merely to seize upon its parts, but not really to unite them [because they’re already united, independently of the mind!]…. In the totality there is a lack of any intuitive unification, as that sort of unification so clearly manifests itself in the metaphysical or continuous whole” (114).

Husserl has succeeded in distinguishing between natural and artificially synthesized wholes, on the one hand, and, on the other hand, those totalities that are known as having been accomplished neither by natural aggregation nor by mental combination. The unity of such wholes is known to be real, even though it admits of subsequent mental analysis or physical dissection.

Again ironically, in his concluding discussion of “number” Husserl neglects to notice the number one even as he employs it to illustrate how combination works. Substituting the term “and” for the term “collective combination,” Husserl remarks:

“(T)otality or multiplicity in abstracto is nothing other than ‘something or other’, and ‘something or other’, and ‘something or other’, etc.; or, more briefly, one thing, and one thing, and one thing, etc. Thus we see that the concept of the multiplicity contains, besides the concept of collective combination, only the concept something. Now this most general of all concepts is, as to its origin and content, easily analyzed” (116).

Husserl terms the concept something the most general concept. It stands for any object–real or unreal, physical or psychical–upon which we reflect. Thus he says that multiplicity as a concept arises out of the indetermination of the et-cetera that allows the series of “one and one and one and …” to go however far you like.

Yet an objection must be registered concerning what Husserl has found but not noticed. Multiplicity is but relatively undetermined; ultimately, multiplicity is in fact determined, or reined in, by one itself. This happens at three points. (a) One is the starting point of the counting series. Every number except the first number is a multiplicity; therefore the set of natural numbers is greater (by one!) than the set of multiplicities. (b) One determines the unit of counting. Only one something at a time gets counted. The and‘s must be put in between one‘s. (c) Although the series can stop anywhere, nevertheless it has to stop at one single place, not at several places. Every number is one distinct number.

Husserl, however, tries to produce the concept number by suppressing what he has taken to be the absolute indetermination of the something-series. This is how he gets determinate multiplicity, which he equates with number. In other words, the and‘s are the main ingredient for making numbers Husserl-style. This is incorrect, of course, but it is incorrect in an interesting way. For example, to make the number five, you would need four and‘s. To come up with those four and‘s, you would have to count them out; but before you could count to four, you would need three and‘s with which to make that four. But… there’s a regression back to one. The number five is four and’s, and five one’s.

The maddening difficulty of focusing upon combination eventually will have a happy outcome, which Husserl did not see in 1887. The truly interesting problem is one, the prime ingredient in numbers and the determiner whose own determination was to become Husserl’s guiding quest.

4. Logical Investigations (Logische Untersuchungen, 1900-01)

With the turn of the century, Husserl’s attention turned from and to one; that is, away from the mental activity of combining, and toward that which is reliably there to be combined. He wanted to show that mental activity is not the source of the latter. Chapter 8 of LU I exposes and refutes the three premises or “prejudices” of psychologism. In short, “psychologism” for Husserl is the error of collapsing the normative or regulative discipline of logic down onto the merely descriptive discipline of psychology. It would make mental operations (such as combination) the source of their own regulation. The “should” of logic, that utter necessity inhering in logical inference, would become no more than the “is” or facticity of our customary thinking processes, empirically described.

Husserl’s formulation and refutation of the three psychologistic premises is wickedly clever, but cannot be treated in detail here. (See # 43-49 of LU I.) One example must suffice. Psychologism, Husserl charges, would place logical inferences on the same plane with mental operations (# 44), and this would make even mathematics into a branch of psychology (# 45). Indeed, math and logic do have structures that are isomorphic to those of mental operations, such as combination and distinction. But given that similarity, how then would one distinguish the regulation of any of these processes from the description of it? Under psychologism, there’s no way. But Husserl makes the distinction in a way that also shows how regulation (that is, the laws of logic) comes from elsewhere than the plane of mental activity.

And he does this by virtue of one. In # 46 Husserl agrees with his opponents that arithmetical operations occur in patterns that refer back to mental acts for their origin and also for their meaning. However, there’s a difference between them as well. Mental acts transpire in time: they begin and end, and they can be repeated and individually counted. Numbers, in contrast, are timeless. While they can be represented in mental acts, this representation is not a fresh production of the number but rather an instantiation of its form. There is only one five. Any time we count five things, it isn’t a production of a new five but merely a deja vu for the same old five, eternal five. We can’t count numbers themselves, for there’s only one of each. (A similar argument is made in #22 of Ideas I.)

The same goes for logic, Husserl says. Concepts comprising the laws of pure logic can have no empirical range. Their range or sphere is ideal singulars, not mental generalizations from multiple instantiations. The operators of logic are other than those mental acts that happen to share the same names: “and,” “not,” “is,” “or,” “implies,” “may,” “must,” “should.” Psychologically, there can be many factual acts of combining, negating, etc. Logically, there is only one “and,” one “not,” etc. Husserl concedes here, as he did for arithmetic, that the logical operators take their origin and meaning from the mental acts. This accounts for the equivocal character of logical terms, which refer both to ideal singulars, and to mental states and acts. But if you fail to notice this equivocation, you become ensnared in psychologism, losing the possibility of pure logic and unified science.

The danger of equivocation extends over judgments as well. On the one hand, we can count multiple apperceptive events of affirmation, occurring psychologically, which proceed in time, begin and end, and recur as often as we like, in happenings that can be distinguished one from another. On the other hand, the judgment thus reached remains the same throughout each act accessing it. It seems to persist and to be called back for encore appearances; it seems even to have pre-existed its first appearance to me (# 47). In this latter sense, the judgment is not the same as the mental act that reaches it. Moreover, the truth of the judgment is neither equivalent to nor dependent upon the psychological experience of clear evidence that accompanies the mental act embracing it. Husserl easily shows this by recalling that in both logic and arithmetic, there are truths that have never been entertained in any human consciousness, and indeed could never be humanly conceived (# 50). (Cases of truth without the possibility of psychological evidence would include the computation of very large numbers, and decisions about membership in sets that are uncountably large. The arithmetical and logical operations connected with such determinations could never be “done” by a human mind or a computer. Their truth cannot be “factual.”)

The number one, then, has become Husserl’s touchstone for discriminating between psychological processes and logical laws. It is his reality detector. What is psychological (or empirical) comes on in discrete individual instances–ones–and you can examine their edges. What is logical (or ideal) comes on as a seamless oceanic unity without temporal edges, reliably persisting even when not attended to. Husserl’s sensitivity to the modes of unity, first expressed in the Habilitationsschrift and developed in LU, provides the launching pad for transcendental phenomenology.

5. Ideas I (Ideen I, 1913)

What launches transcendental phenomenology is the recognition that those modes of unity correlate with each other and with a third mode of unity, in ways that are tantalizingly asymmetrical. These three onenesses are: the factual unity of things and states of affairs, the eidetic unity of essences, and the living unity of consciousness as it flows along in a stream of experiences. Each has, and exhibits, its own distinctive kind of identity and persistence. Factual and essential unities give objects to the straightforward regard of consciousness, entering it as items of experience, each in its distinctive way; but consciousness can also deflect its regard back onto these enterings and discover its own unity, which is unlike either of theirs.

The possibility of this complex correlation is provided by the “principle of principles”: that intuitions come on to us with distinctive boundary-conditions that we can accept as sources insuring the correctness of our knowledge of them. Or in Husserl’s formulation:

“… that every originary presentive intuition is a legitimizing source of cognition, that everything originarily (so to speak, in its “personal” actuality) offered to us in ‘intuition’ is to be accepted simply as what it is presented as being, but also only within the limits in which it is presented there” (44).

The different kinds of unities have different kinds of edges, and these give away what kind of a unity each of them is going to be. But it’s easy to miss the differences. That happens in the natural attitude, Husserl says, when all the objects of consciousness are taken as if they were factual items. Husserl complains that even his Logische Untersuchungen have been misunderstood as advocating just this error of “Platonic realism,” by those who read into his use of the term “object” the implication that, through a perverse hypostatization, every thought turns into a thing (# 22). On the contrary, he says, the eidetic reduction, operative already in LU, empowers him to differentiate between how essences appear, and how cases appear.

Now with Ideen I, this distinction is sketched in beautiful detail. You can tell when the object occupying your consciousness is a physical thing, because things don’t give themselves to you all at once. What you get instead is a perspective inviting you to move around to the other side to perceive some more of the thing. All the while the thing keeps its unity to itself, as the reference point of all the angles it gives to you, and out of which you must reproduce or copy or simulate the unified thing as you conceive it. But in conceiving, you don’t have to put an “and” between two separate perceptions, the north face of a building and the south face, in order to yield the perception of the building as if it were a sum. These different views are given to you as continuous, as views of one thing.

Husserl terms this “shading off” or adumbration. (The notion of off-shading is reminiscent of a multiple-exposure photograph that captures successive phases of a movement in a single frame. Such photos were being seen for the first time at the turn of the century. Husserl also mentions new media such as the stereoscope and the cinema.) In contrast, essences give themselves to you all at once. Their boundaries are not sides, but rather laws entailing the characteristic necessities and possibilities of kinds of things (more about which below). The unity of any particular essence coheres within that determinate outermost boundary which free imaginative variations of possible cases must not exceed if they are to remain cases of this particular kind. Essential unity is centripetal, so to speak.

Then are those other unities–the ones presenting themselves as extended or factual–to be termed centrifugal, inasmuch as each spins off appearances in all directions from an inaccessible center? No, for their off-shading appears contextualized, as a foreground; and even as we focus upon the foreground it pulls its background into readiness for perception as soon as attention may shift to it. Every one is surrounded by a halo of and‘s, and beyond that are other somethings, seemingly without end. Whatever is extended is inexorably connected to whatever else is extended. (This last formulation, by the way, is an instance of an eidetic law. But the shift of attention that brings this essential rule into view is an eidetic reduction, and it wrenches us away from our naive attention to instances of things naturally appearing, under consideration here.) Every perception “motivates” another, stretching on toward expanding horizons.

The shift to the transcendental attitude–that is, the phenomenological or transcendental reduction–brings to Husserl’s notice a third kind of unity, which discloses the off-shading of things in a startling new way. We notice now that what is adumbrated is spatial, but the adumbration itself is not spatial. It arises in consciousness. “Abschattung ist Erlebnis” (95), while what is adumbrated, das Abgeschattete, has to be something spatial. The off-shading of things is at the same time the streaming of conscious life. Peculiarly, the giving off of partial perceptibilities (by the thing) coincides with the taking up of partial perceptions (by streaming consciousness). Which one is doing the shading? Agency cannot be imputed absolutely to either side.

But on the “side” of consciousness, as it were, we now recognize that we are dealing with more than a progression of life-bites strung together in series with and‘s. The stream of conscious life is not a sum or aggregate; nor is it a generalization. That is, it exhibits a unity unlike either the sachverhaltig unity of a factual case or the eidetisch unity of an essence. Husserl must account for that unity, which he calls an ego, Ich.

Moreover, and of paramount significance, with the benefit of the transcendental reduction it can now be told that these three kinds of unities themselves are not connected merely in series, with and‘s combining them, as if they were three discrete somethings. Their relationship is vastly more subtle. In order to understand it, through reduction we try to isolate unity from what accounts for unity. (We are not looking for something “prior to” unity — such as some “cause” of unity –, because we can’t have priority without having the number one, and oneness is just what is in question.)

Isolating oneness from the live experience-stream means removing the individual subject (you or me or Napoleon or whomever) from consideration. What is left, says Husserl, is transcendental subjectivity, “the pure act-process with its own essence” (“das reine Akterlebnis mit seinem eigenen Wesen“). (Paradoxically, we can see, right here in this formulation, that the reduction has not at all done away with essence, with states of affairs, or even with identity. We still have Eigenheit and Wesen, set in relation within a sentence. But these are now supposedly purified.) Husserl likens this de-individualized ego to a ray (# 92) or glance (# 101). Characteristically (or essentially) it has two poles or directions: the noematic and the noetic (from Greek terms noema and noesis, indicating what is thought and the act of thinking, respectively).

Husserl’s discussion of “noetic-noematic structures” fails in its attempt to show how the ego reaches and secures both the unity of the known object, and the unity of the knowing subject. But it fails in a spectacular starburst of insight. Husserl notices that the mental stream has its own distinctive kind of adumbrations or continuities, which are more complex than those discussed above, the relatively simple off-shaded appearings of spatial objects in perception. Beyond that simple sort of off-shading, consciousness can also turn back on itself and reflect upon its own intending acts, or on any component thereof. The stream meanders among spatial objects, but can also at whim objectify aspects of its own acts of intending, and consider them. This yields a thick layering of possible objects (# 97). For example, here are some noemata that might enter the live experience stream: pencils … writing … German verbs … the frustration of strong verbs … Ulrike … memories in general … the unreliability of memory … components of perceptions … the advisability of analyzing perceptions into their components … the smell of popcorn wafting into the study … the effort to resist distractions … and so forth.

Some of these arise directly from things, while others arise as objectifications of what was inherent a moment ago in the very act of knowing, the noesis. How can we tell the difference? Husserl answers that you can tell when the ego-beam has penetrated through to the bottom of the stack of noemata, so to speak, and has gotten ahold of a thing itself, because at that point, all the aspects of the thing are known immanently–really–in the act of perceiving as being contained in the sense of the thing (# 98). For example, you know popcorn itself when you are perceiving the taste of butter and salt. (You do not know popcorn when you read this sentence; instead, you are reflecting on what it is to know popcorn, and popcorn’s qualities are not given immanently within your object. But then while tasting popcorn, saltiness was given immanently but not objectified.)

Husserl rightly points out that we are able to slide up and down the pole of the ego-beam at will, moving now toward the thing, now away from it to consider the act of knowing and its modalities. For example, noematically I can consider a certain cat who probably exists, but then I can turn back noetically to assess the degree of certitude that characterizes my consideration of that selfsame cat as existing (# 105). Now if we were to slide down to the point where all modalities are behind us on the noetic side of the pole, and if there we were to face the object, we would get the pure sense of the object in which its unity is given.

In # 102 Husserl claims that this can happen, and that we can indeed slide far enough toward the object that the unity of the noema will be known as not having been imposed by the act of knowing. At that point, all of its qualities supposedly will be given immanently, really, contained in the perception rather than in the secondary conscious act that may grasp it a split-second later. Its sense will have been captured as something known with certainty to comprise its qualities, without the interference of a synthetic conscious act. (If this worked, it would effectively ensure the objectivity of knowledge, and would win the day for realism against idealism.) Husserl writes:

“The noematic objects … are unities transcendent to, but evidentially intended to in, the mental process. But if that is the case, then characteristics, which arise in [those unities] for consciousness and which are seized upon as their properties in focusing the regard on them, cannot possibly be regarded as really inherent moments of the mental process” (248-249).

Rather, they inhere in the object’s sense, and subsequently are lifted out for analysis in the mental process.

The ambitiousness of this claim is matched by that of another, which has to do with the opposite end of the ego-pole. In # 108 Husserl says that we can also shinny far enough up the ego-pole that we can capture the affirming noesis in its purity. All the modalities will have been loaded over onto the side of the noema, and the no_sis will be a believing affirmation, pure and simple: an unqualified yes. Thus Husserl insists that there is a crucial difference between (a) being validly negated and (b) not-being. For example, he would distinguish (a) denying correctly that my spayed cat has a kitten, from (b) affirming that the kitten of my spayed cat is a non-entity. With (a), the negativity inheres in the noesis, which has not yet been purified of all modality; but with (b), the noesis would be pure affirmation (# 104).

How correct is Husserl’s argument? We must grant that whatever makes this particular kitten impossible inheres elsewhere than in my knowing about it, for my denying something can’t make it go away. Furthermore, there’s nothing to prevent my forcing myself to think positively the thought of the kitten that my cat never had. Such a noetic posture is at least conceivable. However, its mere possibility is not enough to accomplish Husserl’s purpose. Husserl needs to show that this pure affirming belief really is done, somewhere somehow, in the toughest case, the case of an intrinsically impossible entity such as the kitten of a spayed cat. (That is, has anyone succeeded in recapturing that magic moment of purely affirming noesis with regard to an intrinsically impossible object? And if so, how would one go about certifying the accomplishment?)

Unfortunately, neither end of the ego-ray connects as Husserl had hoped. At the noetic pole, the purely affirming ego eludes the grasp of consciousness; so does the pure sense of the thing itself, at the noematic pole. These terms may remain as ideal asymptotes toward which the ego-ray continually points while continually falling short. The successful recovery of the connection between knowing and reality awaits another strategy, to be mounted by Husserl in the posthumously published second volume of Ideen.

6. Ideas II (Ideen II)

The second volume of Husserl’s Ideen (publication withheld until 1952) is the work of many hands. Husserl was dissatisfied with it and did not publish it. The first draft was written very rapidly in 1912, immediately after the manuscript of the first volume was completed. Husserl added material in 1915, and turned it over for editing to his assistant Edith Stein, who had come with him to Freiburg from Gottingen. Stein transcribed the work from Husserl’s shorthand in 1916. He gave her further material, and in 1918 she produced a collation arranged and titled as at present: the constitution of material nature, of animal nature, and of the cultural world. But Husserl’s phenomenology was evolving, and the manuscript did not suit him. Another assistant, Ludwig Landgrebe, worked on it 1923-25, and Husserl himself edited it in again 1928. It finally came out posthumously.

If the pursuit of unity had guided Husserl like a north star from his earliest writing on through the discovery and first articulation of phenomenology, then in Ideen II that star becomes obscured by “light pollution” from numerous more recent and competing insights. Without access to the manuscripts, it is impossible to know with precision how that came about. In portions of the text as we have it, the concern with unity remains a significant factor.

However, other portions seem to go against the grain of key insights from the first volume and the earlier works. For example, in LU and Ideen I, the material sphere had comprised states of affairs; that is, facts or cases such as could be expressed in logical propositions. There were indeed “things” in there, such as roses, yet the emphasis was upon the factual scenarios into which these things figured. By contrast, in Ideen II “material nature” is populated with substantial items, and the fact they are embedded in circumstances has to be additionally stipulated, almost as an afterthought (# 15c). By the same token, in the earlier work the eidetic sphere had comprised the forms of logical propositions and the rules of inference. While there were indeed “essences” entailed there, nevertheless the emphasis fell upon the lawful patterns of thinking about being. By contrast, in Ideen II “animal nature” is populated by psychic items whose unity is analogous to that of physical things yet whose active engagement with the latter can hardly be explained.

This shift matters, because judgments and perceptions reach unity in quite different ways. To certify that one selfsame proposition (e.g., that the cat is on the mat) returns to our consciousness on several occasions is quite a different task than to certify that one selfsame substantial entity (e.g., this mat-loving cat) returns to our sight every afternoon. Husserl’s early discoveries about unity had to do with judgment, and they were based upon the lived difference between synthetic judgments and analytic judgments. His ambitions then were not primarily metaphysical or epistemological. Moreover, it is relatively easy to “feel” the difference among three sorts of judgment: (a) a synthetic judgment that arbitrarily groups several items together, (b) a synthetic judgment that groups things in recognition of some characteristic that all share independently of the judgment, and (c) a judgment that the unity imputed to a thing is not owing to judgment at all. The distinction among these judgment-forms was already established in the Habilitationsschrift. However the task undertaken in Ideen II is forcibly to transpose that distinction onto perception, and so to come up with a general test for certifying when knowledge is genuinely in touch with reality.

This project is set in motion in # 9, where new terminology is introduced for the threefold distinction first made in “Begriff der Zahl.” (However, now that the transcendental reduction is presupposed, the arrow of causality should be removed. There can be only correlation or its absence.) BZ’s “psychic relation” now becomes “categorial synthesis,” in which perception serendipitously collects disparate items into one group, for no special reason intrinsic to the items. BZ’s “content relation” (or “physical relation”) becomes “aesthetic synthesis” (or “sensuous synthesis”), in which perception recognizes some intrinsic reason for grouping these items and finds itself constrained to do so by something other than mere whim. And BZ’s uncomposed unity (e.g., “that rose there”) becomes the “pure sense-object.”

In BZ, “synthesis” meant a combining judgment: a judgment that erected a set of things with many members. A set with one member–that is, a unified thing–obviously needed no synthesizing judgment to set it up. In Ideen II, however, “synthesis” means a perception that, while receiving multiple impressions (the off-shadings or Abschattungen), composes an object out of them. But this object is a unity, not a group; in fact, it is what Husserl would earlier have called an uncomposed unity. In other words aesthetic synthesis–operating now over partial views, not discrete items–finds that it has a reason for referring those multiple impressions to one object, even though the unity of the thing never gives itself directly to consciousness. What is that reason? This question is enticing, because Husserl is tantalizingly close here to describing a way in which the real unity of things is available for knowledge.

Husserl works on this question in # 15b, where “the spatial body is a synthetic unity of a manifold of strata of ‘sensuous appearances’ of different senses” (42-43). The spatially extended thing is a unity drawing together all the experiences we have had of it, and summoning us toward further experiences of it through sight and touch and our other senses. It achieves its unity as a spatial location, which seems not to depend upon whether or not it is actually perceived.

However, Husserl cautions, this unity alone is insufficient to validate itself. He writes:

“(W)e have first taken the body as independent of all causal conditioning, i.e., merely as a unity which presents itself visually or tactually, through multiplicities of sensations, as endowed with an inner content of characteristic features…. But in what we have said, it is also implied that under the presupposition referred to (namely, that we take the thing outside of the nexuses in which it is a thing) we do not find, as we carry out experiences, any possibility for deciding, in a way that exhibits, whether the experienced material thing is actual or whether we are subject to mere illusion and are experiencing a mere phantom” (43).

Thus, reality is not guaranteed for an isolated item, even when it seems to be giving us a reason to take it as the unified core attracting its manifold appearings to one hub of reference. The central location of the thing is dependent upon its real circumstances, as Husserl goes on to say in # 15c. The reality of “one” depends on “others”; i.e., on thing-connection. The thing is what it is in relation to its surroundings. This becomes apparent when things move and change, for their changes must correlate coherently with reciprocal changes in the things next to them.

Such co-variance is what certifies reality–or materiality, which Husserl seems to equate with it. In # 15c, reality means substantial causality. Within the webwork of material things, everything affects everything else. The real is the causal. Co-variance across the material realm, then, is what certifies the oneness and reality of that realm (# 15e).

Animated bodies also connect in the webwork of material things (# 13). Each of them is a center of appearings, a one, just as every other thing is. However, unlike soulless bodies, each animal is also a zero. It lives at a point of origination. The animal body bears the zero-point of orientation for the pure ego (61), as its absolute “here” (135, 166). Arithmetically, this is a stunning contrast. Every “something” whatsoever is either a one or a one-and-one-and-etc. But the animated body, in addition to being just one of those somethings, is also the one who is zero: the one from whom the counting starts, the one who chooses whether and where it is appropriate to insert the and‘s.

But any series that is initiated by/at/in the living body is counted off nonarbitrarily. Such series go in order; they are “motivated.” This is owing to the movement of the body itself within the material web. The body’s own kinesthetic sense will coordinate with the corresponding changes in sensory perceptions as it navigates among things. Thus, the zero shifts position in relation to the other unified centers to which perceptions accrue; but as it does so, the series of their appearings change in a regular way (63).

What about counting zero’s? Are they multiple; are there many human bodies? Husserl declines to pursue this avenue of approach into the problem of other minds and human community. Intersubjectivity will treated instead as an implication of the reality of the material world, not a precondition for it. The multiplicity of bodies is taken up only on page 83, where it is admitted that the foregoing analysis has been framed on the assumption that there would be only one, “solipsistic,” point-zero in reality. Belatedly, other bodies now are brought into the picture–but not because they are necessary for its unity, or because they have been apprehended among the realities presenting to consciousness. The others are brought in because they are required for the full unification of the thing in reality, whether that thing is one of the physical bodies or my very own live body. To be is to be describable (87). Reality for the thing entails a possibility of appearing to anyone at all. Being counted from one zero-point is not enough for the real thing. To count, it needs the possibility of being counted from multiple directions.

The thing is a rule of appearances. That means that the thing is a reality as a unity of a manifold of appearances connected according to rules. Moreover, this unity is an intersubjective one…. The physicalistic thing is intersubjectively common in that it has validity for all individuals who stand in possible communion with us (91-92).

To be real, the thing must count as a place or location, a center, independently of any particular point of origin. Yet what grants reality to the thing is not some consensus reached by observers. Indeed, the thing may look entirely different to different observers; however, its reality constrains all to agree that, at least, “it is there.” Oddly, then, the real thing is another kind of zero, for its barest reality consists in its being an empty place-holder (91-93).

Finally, Husserl makes unity a synonym for the philosophical term “substance” as traditionally meant. For example, he says that both the soul and the body are unities, so that an analogy obtains between psychic unity and material unity (129, 131). Oneness becomes the ontological form that determines substantial reality (133). The pure ego is one with respect to an individual stream of consciousness, that is, before the transcendental reduction has de-individuated the latter (117); however the pure ego is insubstantial and not one whenever the reduction is in effect (128).

And so Husserl’s quest for unity splinters and spends itself out by diverting into many contradictory projects pursued by the many unharmonized voices of Ideen II. Although the manuscript remained unpublished, it was made available for consultation by a number of Husserl’s younger colleagues. Among the last publication of Husserl’s lifetime was the Cartesian Meditations of 1931, in which he addressed the apparent solipsism of his transcendental phenomenology. That work itself was undergoing a comprehensive reworking in partnership with Husserl’s assistant Eugen Fink during the years before Husserl’s death in 1938.

7. References and Further Reading

Husserl’s publications and his extensive Nachlass are being brought out in a multi-volume critical edition entitled Husserliana – Edmund Husserl, Gesammelte Werke, from Nijhoff in The Hague. The major works published during Husserl’s lifetime are the following:

Über den Begriff der Zahl. Psychologische Analysen, 1887.
Philosophie der Arithmetik. Psychologische und logische Untersuchungen, 1891.
Logische Untersuchungen. Erste Teil: Prolegomena zur reinen Logik, 1900; reprinted 1913.
Logische Untersuchungen. Zweite Teil: Untersuchungen zur Phänomenologie und Theorie der Erkenntnis, 1901; second edition 1913 (for part one); second edition 1921 (for part two).
“Philosophie als strenge Wissenschaft,” Logos 1 (1911) 289-341.
Ideen zu einer reinen Ph‰nomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Erstes Buch: Allgemeine Einführung in die reine Phänomenologie, 1913.
“Vorlesungen zur Phänomenologie des inneren Zeitbewusstseins,” Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung 9 (1928), 367-498.
“Formale und transzendentale Logik. Versuch einer Kritik der logischen Vernunft,” Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung 10 (1929) 1-298.
Mèditations cartèsiennes, 1931.
“Die Krisis der europäischen Wissenschaften und die transzentale Phänomenologie: Eine Einleitung in die phänomenologische Philosophie,” Philosophia 1 (1936) 77-176.

Works translated into English by Husserl (In chronological order. Publication dates of the German originals are in brackets.)

“Philosophy as Rigorous Science,” trans. in Q. Lauer (ed.), Phenomenology and the Crisis of Philosophy, New York: Harper [1910], 1965.
Formal and Transcendental Logic, trans. D. Cairns. The Hague: Nijhoff [1929], 1969.
The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Philosophy, trans. D. Carr. Evanston: Northwestern University Press
[1936/54], 1970.
Logical Investigations, trans. J. N. Findlay, London: Routledge [1900/01; 2nd, revised edition 1913], 1973.
Experience and Judgement, trans. J. S. Churchill and K. Ameriks, London: Routledge [1939], 1973.
Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy – Third Book: Phenomenology and the Foundations of the Sciences, trans. T. E. Klein and W. E. Pohl, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1980.
Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy — First Book: General Introduction to a Pure Phenomenology, trans. F. Kersten. The Hague: Nijhoff (= Ideas) [1913], 1982.
Cartesian Meditations, trans. D. Cairns, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1931], 1988.
Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy – Second Book: Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution, trans. R. Rojcewicz and A. Schuwer, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989.
On the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1893-1917), trans. J. B. Brough, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1928], 1990.
Early Writings in the Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics, trans. D. Willard, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1994.
The Essential Husserl, ed. D. Welton, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999.

Author Information

Marianne Sawicki
Email: law.sawicki@gmail.com
Huntingdon, Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

Hedonism

The term “hedonism,” from the Greek word ἡδονή (hēdonē) for pleasure, refers to several related theories about what is good for us, how we should behave, and what motivates us to behave in the way that we do. All hedonistic theories identify pleasure and pain as the only important elements of whatever phenomena they are designed to describe. If hedonistic theories identified pleasure and pain as merely two important elements, instead of the only important elements of what they are describing, then they would not be nearly as unpopular as they all are. However, the claim that pleasure and pain are the only things of ultimate importance is what makes hedonism distinctive and philosophically interesting.

Philosophical hedonists tend to focus on hedonistic theories of value, and especially of well-being (the good life for the one living it). As a theory of value, hedonism states that all and only pleasure is intrinsically valuable and all and only pain is intrinsically not valuable. Hedonists usually define pleasure and pain broadly, such that both physical and mental phenomena are included. Thus, a gentle massage and recalling a fond memory are both considered to cause pleasure and stubbing a toe and hearing about the death of a loved one are both considered to cause pain. With pleasure and pain so defined, hedonism as a theory about what is valuable for us is intuitively appealing. Indeed, its appeal is evidenced by the fact that nearly all historical and contemporary treatments of well-being allocate at least some space for discussion of hedonism. Unfortunately for hedonism, the discussions rarely endorse it and some even deplore its focus on pleasure.

This article begins by clarifying the different types of hedonistic theories and the labels they are often given. Then, hedonism’s ancient origins and its subsequent development are reviewed. The majority of this article is concerned with describing the important theoretical divisions within Prudential Hedonism and discussing the major criticisms of these approaches.

Types of Hedonism
The Origins of Hedonism
The Development of Hedonism
1. Bentham
2. Mill
3. Moore
Contemporary Varieties of Hedonism
Contemporary Objections
The Future of Hedonism
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary and Mixed Sources

1. Types of Hedonism

a. Folk Hedonism

When the term “hedonism” is used in modern literature, or by non-philosophers in their everyday talk, its meaning is quite different from the meaning it takes when used in the discussions of philosophers. Non-philosophers tend to think of a hedonist as a person who seeks out pleasure for themselves without any particular regard for their own future well-being or for the well-being of others. According to non-philosophers, then, a stereotypical hedonist is someone who never misses an opportunity to indulge of the pleasures of sex, drugs, and rock ‘n’ roll, even if the indulgences are likely to lead to relationship problems, health problems, regrets, or sadness for themselves or others. Philosophers commonly refer to this everyday understanding of hedonism as “Folk Hedonism.” Folk Hedonism is a rough combination of Motivational Hedonism, Hedonistic Egoism, and a reckless lack of foresight.

b. Value Hedonism and Prudential Hedonism

When philosophers discuss hedonism, they are most likely to be referring to hedonism about value, and especially the slightly more specific theory, hedonism about well-being. Hedonism as a theory about value (best referred to as Value Hedonism) holds that all and only pleasure is intrinsically valuable and all and only pain is intrinsically disvaluable. The term “intrinsically” is an important part of the definition and is best understood in contrast to the term “instrumentally.” Something is intrinsically valuable if it is valuable for its own sake. Pleasure is thought to be intrinsically valuable because, even if it did not lead to any other benefit, it would still be good to experience. Money is an example of an instrumental good; its value for us comes from what we can do with it (what we can buy with it). The fact that a copious amount of money has no value if no one ever sells anything reveals that money lacks intrinsic value. Value Hedonism reduces everything of value to pleasure. For example, a Value Hedonist would explain the instrumental value of money by describing how the things we can buy with money, such as food, shelter, and status-signifying goods, bring us pleasure or help us to avoid pain.

Hedonism as a theory about well-being (best referred to as Prudential Hedonism) is more specific than Value Hedonism because it stipulates what the value is for. Prudential Hedonism holds that all and only pleasure intrinsically makes people’s lives go better for them and all and only pain intrinsically makes their lives go worse for them. Some philosophers replace “people” with “animals” or “sentient creatures,” so as to apply Prudential Hedonism more widely. A good example of this comes from Peter Singer’s work on animals and ethics. Singer questions why some humans can see the intrinsic disvalue in human pain, but do not also accept that it is bad for sentient non-human animals to experience pain.

When Prudential Hedonists claim that happiness is what they value most, they intend happiness to be understood as a preponderance of pleasure over pain. An important distinction between Prudential Hedonism and Folk Hedonism is that Prudential Hedonists usually understand that pursuing pleasure and avoiding pain in the very short-term is not always the best strategy for achieving the best long-term balance of pleasure over pain.

Prudential Hedonism is an integral part of several derivative types of hedonistic theory, all of which have featured prominently in philosophical debates of the past. Since Prudential Hedonism plays this important role, the majority of this article is dedicated to Prudential Hedonism. First, however, the main derivative types of hedonism are briefly discussed.

c. Motivational Hedonism

Motivational Hedonism (more commonly referred to by the less descriptive label, “Psychological Hedonism“) is the theory that the desires to encounter pleasure and to avoid pain guide all of our behavior. Most accounts of Motivational Hedonism include both conscious and unconscious desires for pleasure, but emphasize the latter. Epicurus, William James, Sigmund Freud, Jeremy Bentham, John Stuart Mill, and (on one interpretation) even Charles Darwin have all argued for varieties of Motivational Hedonism. Bentham used the idea to support his theory of Hedonistic Utilitarianism (discussed below). Weak versions of Motivational Hedonism hold that the desires to seek pleasure and avoid pain often or always have some influence on our behavior. Weak versions are generally considered to be uncontroversially true and not especially useful for philosophy.

Philosophers have been more interested in strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism, which hold that all behavior is governed by the desires to encounter pleasure and to avoid pain (and only those desires). Strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism have been used to support some of the normative types of hedonism and to argue against non-hedonistic normative theories. One of the most notable mentions of Motivational Hedonism is Plato’s Ring of Gyges example in The Republic. Plato’s Socrates is discussing with Glaucon how men would react if they were to possess a ring that gives its wearer immense powers, including invisibility. Glaucon believes that a strong version of Motivational Hedonism is true, but Socrates does not. Glaucon asserts that, emboldened with the power provided by the Ring of Gyges, everyone would succumb to the inherent and ubiquitous desire to pursue their own ends at the expense of others. Socrates disagrees, arguing that good people would be able to overcome this desire because of their strong love of justice, fostered through philosophising.

Strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism currently garner very little support for similar reasons. Many examples of seemingly-pain-seeking acts performed out of a sense of duty are well-known – from the soldier who jumps on a grenade to save his comrades to that time you rescued a trapped dog only to be (predictably) bitten in the process. Introspective evidence also weighs against strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism; many of the decisions we make seem to be based on motives other than seeking pleasure and avoiding pain. Given these reasons, the burden of proof is considered to be squarely on the shoulders of anyone wishing to argue for a strong account of Motivational Hedonism.

d. Normative Hedonism

Value Hedonism, occasionally with assistance from Motivational Hedonism, has been used to argue for specific theories of right action (theories that explain which actions are morally permissible or impermissible and why). The theory that happiness should be pursued (that pleasure should be pursued and pain should be avoided) is referred to as Normative Hedonism and sometimes Ethical Hedonism. There are two major types of Normative Hedonism, Hedonistic Egoism and Hedonistic Utilitarianism. Both types commonly use happiness (defined as pleasure minus pain) as the sole criterion for determining the moral rightness or wrongness of an action. Important variations within each of these two main types specify either the actual resulting happiness (after the act) or the predicted resulting happiness (before the act) as the moral criterion. Although both major types of Normative Hedonism have been accused of being repugnant, Hedonistic Egoism is considered the most offensive.

e. Hedonistic Egoism

Hedonistic Egoism is a hedonistic version of egoism, the theory that we should, morally speaking, do whatever is most in our own interests. Hedonistic Egoism is the theory that we ought, morally speaking, to do whatever makes us happiest – that is whatever provides us with the most net pleasure after pain is subtracted. The most repugnant feature of this theory is that one never has to ascribe any value whatsoever to the consequences for anyone other than oneself. For example, a Hedonistic Egoist who did not feel saddened by theft would be morally required to steal, even from needy orphans (if he thought he could get away with it). Would-be defenders of Hedonistic Egoism often point out that performing acts of theft, murder, treachery and the like would not make them happier overall because of the guilt, the fear of being caught, and the chance of being caught and punished. The would-be defenders tend to surrender, however, when it is pointed out that a Hedonistic Egoist is morally obliged by their own theory to pursue an unusual kind of practical education; a brief and possibly painful training period that reduces their moral emotions of sympathy and guilt. Such an education might be achieved by desensitising over-exposure to, and performance of, torture on innocents. If Hedonistic Egoists underwent such an education, their reduced capacity for sympathy and guilt would allow them to take advantage of any opportunities to perform pleasurable, but normally-guilt-inducing, actions, such as stealing from the poor.

Hedonistic Egoism is very unpopular amongst philosophers, not just for this reason, but also because it suffers from all of the objections that apply to Prudential Hedonism.

f. Hedonistic Utilitarianism

Hedonistic Utilitarianism is the theory that the right action is the one that produces (or is most likely to produce) the greatest net happiness for all concerned. Hedonistic Utilitarianism is often considered fairer than Hedonistic Egoism because the happiness of everyone involved (everyone who is affected or likely to be affected) is taken into account and given equal weight. Hedonistic Utilitarians, then, tend to advocate not stealing from needy orphans because to do so would usually leave the orphan far less happy and the (probably better-off) thief only slightly happier (assuming he felt no guilt). Despite treating all individuals equally, Hedonistic Utilitarianism is still seen as objectionable by some because it assigns no intrinsic moral value to justice, friendship, truth, or any of the many other goods that are thought by some to be irreducibly valuable. For example, a Hedonistic Utilitarian would be morally obliged to publicly execute an innocent friend of theirs if doing so was the only way to promote the greatest happiness overall. Although unlikely, such a situation might arise if a child was murdered in a small town and the lack of suspects was causing large-scale inter-ethnic violence. Some philosophers argue that executing an innocent friend is immoral precisely because it ignores the intrinsic values of justice, friendship, and possibly truth.

Hedonistic Utilitarianism is rarely endorsed by philosophers, but mainly because of its reliance on Prudential Hedonism as opposed to its utilitarian element. Non-hedonistic versions of utilitarianism are about as popular as the other leading theories of right action, especially when it is the actions of institutions that are being considered.

2. The Origins of Hedonism

a. Cārvāka

Perhaps the earliest written record of hedonism comes from the Cārvāka, an Indian philosophical tradition based on the Barhaspatya sutras. The Cārvāka persisted for two thousand years (from about 600 B.C.E.). Most notably, the Cārvāka advocated scepticism and Hedonistic Egoism – that the right action is the one that brings the actor the most net pleasure. The Cārvāka acknowledged that some pain often accompanied, or was later caused by, sensual pleasure, but that pleasure was worth it.

b. Aritippus and the Cyrenaics

The Cyrenaics, founded by Aristippus (c. 435-356 B.C.E.), were also sceptics and Hedonistic Egoists. Although the paucity of original texts makes it difficult to confidently state all of the justifications for the Cyrenaics’ positions, their overall stance is clear enough. The Cyrenaics believed pleasure was the ultimate good and everyone should pursue all immediate pleasures for themselves. They considered bodily pleasures better than mental pleasures, presumably because they were more vivid or trustworthy. The Cyrenaics also recommended pursuing immediate pleasures and avoiding immediate pains with scant or no regard for future consequences. Their reasoning for this is even less clear, but is most plausibly linked to their sceptical views – perhaps that what we can be most sure of in this uncertain existence is our current bodily pleasures.

c. Epicurus

Epicurus (c. 341-271 B.C.E.), founder of Epicureanism, developed a Normative Hedonism in stark contrast to that of Aristippus. The Epicureanism of Epicurus is also quite the opposite to the common usage of Epicureanism; while we might like to go on a luxurious “Epicurean” holiday packed with fine dining and moderately excessive wining, Epicurus would warn us that we are only setting ourselves up for future pain. For Epicurus, happiness was the complete absence of bodily and especially mental pains, including fear of the Gods and desires for anything other than the bare necessities of life. Even with only the limited excesses of ancient Greece on offer, Epicurus advised his followers to avoid towns, and especially marketplaces, in order to limit the resulting desires for unnecessary things. Once we experience unnecessary pleasures, such as those from sex and rich food, we will then suffer from painful and hard to satisfy desires for more and better of the same. No matter how wealthy we might be, Epicurus would argue, our desires will eventually outstrip our means and interfere with our ability to live tranquil, happy lives. Epicureanism is generally egoistic, in that it encourages everyone to pursue happiness for themselves. However, Epicureans would be unlikely to commit any of the selfish acts we might expect from other egoists because Epicureans train themselves to desire only the very basics, which gives them very little reason to do anything to interfere with the affairs of others.

d. The Oyster Example

With the exception of a brief period discussed below, Hedonism has been generally unpopular ever since its ancient beginnings. Although criticisms of the ancient forms of hedonism were many and varied, one in particular was heavily cited. In Philebus, Plato’s Socrates and one of his many foils, Protarchus in this instance, are discussing the role of pleasure in the good life. Socrates asks Protarchus to imagine a life without much pleasure but full of the higher cognitive processes, such as knowledge, forethought and consciousness and to compare it with a life that is the opposite. Socrates describes this opposite life as having perfect pleasure but the mental life of an oyster, pointing out that the subject of such a life would not be able to appreciate any of the pleasure within it. The harrowing thought of living the pleasurable but unthinking life of an oyster causes Protarchus to abandon his hedonistic argument. The oyster example is now easily avoided by clarifying that pleasure is best understood as being a conscious experience, so any sensation that we are not consciously aware of cannot be pleasure.

3. The Development of Hedonism

a. Bentham

Normative and Motivational Hedonism were both at their most popular during the heyday of Empiricism in the 18^th and 19^th Centuries. Indeed, this is the only period during which any kind of hedonism could be considered popular at all. During this period, two Hedonistic Utilitarians, Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832) and his protégé John Stuart Mill (1806-1873), were particularly influential. Their theories are similar in many ways, but are notably distinct on the nature of pleasure.

Bentham argued for several types of hedonism, including those now referred to as Prudential Hedonism, Hedonistic Utilitarianism, and Motivational Hedonism (although his commitment to strong Motivational Hedonism eventually began to wane). Bentham argued that happiness was the ultimate good and that happiness was pleasure and the absence of pain. He acknowledged the egoistic and hedonistic nature of peoples’ motivation, but argued that the maximization of collective happiness was the correct criterion for moral behavior. Bentham’s greatest happiness principle states that actions are immoral if they are not the action that appears to maximise the happiness of all the people likely to be affected; only the action that appears to maximise the happiness of all the people likely to be affected is the morally right action.

Bentham devised the greatest happiness principle to justify the legal reforms he also argued for. He understood that he could not conclusively prove that the principle was the correct criterion for morally right action, but also thought that it should be accepted because it was fair and better than existing criteria for evaluating actions and legislation. Bentham thought that his Hedonic Calculus could be applied to situations to see what should, morally speaking, be done in a situation. The Hedonic Calculus is a method of counting the amount of pleasure and pain that would likely be caused by different actions. The Hedonic Calculus required a methodology for measuring pleasure, which in turn required an understanding of the nature of pleasure and specifically what aspects of pleasure were valuable for us.

Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus identifies several aspects of pleasure that contribute to its value, including certainty, propinquity, extent, intensity, and duration. The Hedonic Calculus also makes use of two future-pleasure-or-pain-related aspects of actions – fecundity and purity. Certainty refers to the likelihood that the pleasure or pain will occur. Propinquity refers to how long away (in terms of time) the pleasure or pain is. Fecundity refers to the likelihood of the pleasure or pain leading to more of the same sensation. Purity refers to the likelihood of the pleasure or pain leading to some of the opposite sensation. Extent refers to the number of people the pleasure or pain is likely to affect. Intensity refers to the felt strength of the pleasure or pain. Duration refers to how long the pleasure or pain are felt for. It should be noted that only intensity and duration have intrinsic value for an individual. Certainty, propinquity, fecundity, and purity are all instrumentally valuable for an individual because they affect the likelihood of an individual feeling future pleasure and pain. Extent is not directly valuable for an individual’s well-being because it refers to the likelihood of other people experiencing pleasure or pain.

Bentham’s inclusion of certainty, propinquity, fecundity, and purity in the Hedonic Calculus helps to differentiate his hedonism from Folk Hedonism. Folk Hedonists rarely consider how likely their actions are to lead to future pleasure or pain, focussing instead on the pursuit of immediate pleasure and the avoidance of immediate pain. So while Folk Hedonists would be unlikely to study for an exam, anyone using Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus would consider the future happiness benefits to themselves (and possibly others) of passing the exam and then promptly begin studying.

Most importantly for Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus, the pleasure from different sources is always measured against these criteria in the same way, that is to say that no additional value is afforded to pleasures from particularly moral, clean, or culturally-sophisticated sources. For example, Bentham held that pleasure from the parlor game push-pin was just as valuable for us as pleasure from music and poetry. Since Bentham’s theory of Prudential Hedonism focuses on the quantity of the pleasure, rather than the source-derived quality of it, it is best described as a type of Quantitative Hedonism.

b. Mill

Bentham’s indifferent stance on the source of pleasures led to others disparaging his hedonism as the philosophy of swine. Even his student, John Stuart Mill, questioned whether we should believe that a satisfied pig leads a better life than a dissatisfied human or that a satisfied fool leads a better life than a dissatisfied Socrates – results that Bentham’s Quantitative Hedonism seems to endorse.

Like Bentham, Mill endorsed the varieties of hedonism now referred to as Prudential Hedonism, Hedonistic Utilitarianism, and Motivational Hedonism. Mill also thought happiness, defined as pleasure and the avoidance of pain, was the highest good. Where Mill’s hedonism differs from Bentham’s is in his understanding of the nature of pleasure. Mill argued that pleasures could vary in quality, being either higher or lower pleasures. Mill employed the distinction between higher and lower pleasures in an attempt to avoid the criticism that his hedonism was just another philosophy of swine. Lower pleasures are those associated with the body, which we share with other animals, such as pleasure from quenching thirst or having sex. Higher pleasures are those associated with the mind, which were thought to be unique to humans, such as pleasure from listening to opera, acting virtuously, and philosophising. Mill justified this distinction by arguing that those who have experienced both types of pleasure realise that higher pleasures are much more valuable. He dismissed challenges to this claim by asserting that those who disagreed lacked either the experience of higher pleasures or the capacity for such experiences. For Mill, higher pleasures were not different from lower pleasures by mere degree; they were different in kind. Since Mill’s theory of Prudential Hedonism focuses on the quality of the pleasure, rather than the amount of it, it is best described as a type of Qualitative Hedonism.

c. Moore

George Edward Moore (1873-1958) was instrumental in bringing hedonism’s brief heyday to an end. Moore’s criticisms of hedonism in general, and Mill’s hedonism in particular, were frequently cited as good reasons to reject hedonism even decades after his death. Indeed, since G. E. Moore, hedonism has been viewed by most philosophers as being an initially intuitive and interesting family of theories, but also one that is flawed on closer inspection. Moore was a pluralist about value and argued persuasively against the Value Hedonists’ central claim – that all and only pleasure is the bearer of intrinsic value. Moore’s most damaging objection against Hedonism was his heap of filth example. Moore himself thought the heap of filth example thoroughly refuted what he saw as the only potentially viable form of Prudential Hedonism – that conscious pleasure is the only thing that positively contributes to well-being. Moore used the heap of filth example to argue that Prudential Hedonism is false because pleasure is not the only thing of value.

In the heap of filth example, Moore asks the reader to imagine two worlds, one of which is exceedingly beautiful and the other a disgusting heap of filth. Moore then instructs the reader to imagine that no one would ever experience either world and asks if it is better for the beautiful world to exist than the filthy one. As Moore expected, his contemporaries tended to agree that it would be better if the beautiful world existed. Relying on this agreement, Moore infers that the beautiful world is more valuable than the heap of filth and, therefore, that beauty must be valuable. Moore then concluded that all of the potentially viable theories of Prudential Hedonism (those that value only conscious pleasures) must be false because something, namely beauty, is valuable even when no conscious pleasure can be derived from it.

Moore’s heap of filth example has rarely been used to object to Prudential Hedonism since the 1970’s because it is not directly relevant to Prudential Hedonism (it evaluates worlds and not lives). Moore’s other objections to Prudential Hedonism also went out of favor around the same time. The demise of these arguments was partly due to mounting objections against them, but mainly because arguments more suited to the task of refuting Prudential Hedonism were developed. These arguments are discussed after the contemporary varieties of hedonism are introduced below.

4. Contemporary Varieties of Hedonism

a. The Main Divisions

Several contemporary varieties of hedonism have been defended, although usually by just a handful of philosophers or less at any one time. Other varieties of hedonism are also theoretically available but have received little or no discussion. Contemporary varieties of Prudential Hedonism can be grouped based on how they define pleasure and pain, as is done below. In addition to providing different notions of what pleasure and pain are, contemporary varieties of Prudential Hedonism also disagree about what aspect or aspects of pleasure are valuable for well-being (and the opposite for pain).

The most well-known disagreement about what aspects of pleasure are valuable occurs between Quantitative and Qualitative Hedonists. Quantitative Hedonists argue that how valuable pleasure is for well-being depends on only the amount of pleasure, and so they are only concerned with dimensions of pleasure such as duration and intensity. Quantitative Hedonism is often accused of over-valuing animalistic, simple, and debauched pleasures.

Qualitative Hedonists argue that, in addition to the dimensions related to the amount of pleasure, one or more dimensions of quality can have an impact on how pleasure affects well-being. The quality dimensions might be based on how cognitive or bodily the pleasure is (as it was for Mill), the moral status of the source of the pleasure, or some other non-amount-related dimension. Qualitative Hedonism is criticised by some for smuggling values other than pleasure into well-being by misleadingly labelling them as dimensions of pleasure. How these qualities are chosen for inclusion is also criticised for being arbitrary or ad hoc by some because inclusion of these dimensions of pleasure is often in direct response to objections that Quantitative Hedonism cannot easily deal with. That is to say, the inclusion of these dimensions is often accused of being an exercise in plastering over holes, rather than deducing corollary conclusions from existing theoretical premises. Others have argued that any dimensions of quality can be better explained in terms of dimensions of quantity. For example, they might claim that moral pleasures are no higher in quality than immoral pleasures, but that moral pleasures are instrumentally more valuable because they are likely to lead to more moments of pleasure or less moments of pain in the future.

Hedonists also have differing views about how the value of pleasure compares with the value of pain. This is not a practical disagreement about how best to measure pleasure and pain, but rather a theoretical disagreement about comparative value, such as whether pain is worse for us than an equivalent amount of pleasure is good for us. The default position is that one unit of pleasure (sometimes referred to as a Hedon) is equivalent but opposite in value to one unit of pain (sometimes referred to as a Dolor). Several Hedonistic Utilitarians have argued that reduction of pain should be seen as more important than increasing pleasure, sometimes for the Epicurean reason that pain seems worse for us than an equivalent amount of pleasure is good for us. Imagine that a magical genie offered for you to play a game with him. The game consists of you flipping a fair coin. If the coin lands on heads, then you immediately feel a burst of very intense pleasure and if it lands on tails, then you immediately feel a burst of very intense pain. Is it in your best interests to play the game?

Another area of disagreement between some Hedonists is whether pleasure is entirely internal to a person or if it includes external elements. Internalism about pleasure is the thesis that, whatever pleasure is, it is always and only inside a person. Externalism about pleasure, on the other hand, is the thesis that, pleasure is more than just a state of an individual (that is, that a necessary component of pleasure lies outside of the individual). Externalists about pleasure might, for example, describe pleasure as a function that mediates between our minds and the environment, such that every instance of pleasure has one or more integral environmental components. The vast majority of historic and contemporary versions of Prudential Hedonism consider pleasure to be an internal mental state.

Perhaps the least known disagreement about what aspects of pleasure make it valuable is the debate about whether we have to be conscious of pleasure for it to be valuable. The standard position is that pleasure is a conscious mental state, or at least that any pleasure a person is not conscious of does not intrinsically improve their well-being.

b. Pleasure as Sensation

The most common definition of pleasure is that it is a sensation, something that we identify through our senses or that we feel. Psychologists claim that we have at least ten senses, including the familiar, sight, hearing, smell, taste, and touch, but also, movement, balance, and several sub-senses of touch, including heat, cold, pressure, and pain. New senses get added to the list when it is understood that some independent physical process underpins their functioning. The most widely-used examples of pleasurable sensations are the pleasures of eating, drinking, listening to music, and having sex. Use of these examples has done little to help Hedonism avoid its debauched reputation.

It is also commonly recognised that our senses are physical processes that usually involve a mental component, such as the tickling feeling when someone blows gently on the back of your neck. If a sensation is something we identify through our sense organs, however, it is not entirely clear how to account for abstract pleasures. This is because abstract pleasures, such as a feeling of accomplishment for a job well done, do not seem to be experienced through any of the senses in the standard lists. Some Hedonists have attempted to resolve this problem by arguing for the existence of an independent pleasure sense and by defining sensation as something that we feel (regardless of whether it has been mediated by sense organs).

Most Hedonists who describe pleasure as a sensation will be Quantitative Hedonists and will argue that the pleasure from the different senses is the same. Qualitative Hedonists, in comparison, can use the framework of the senses to help differentiate between qualities of pleasure. For example, a Qualitative Hedonist might argue that pleasurable sensations from touch and movement are always lower quality than the others.

c. Pleasure as Intrinsically Valuable Experience

Hedonists have also defined pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience, that is to say any experiences that we find intrinsically valuable either are, or include, instances of pleasure. According to this definition, the reason that listening to music and eating a fine meal are both intrinsically pleasurable is because those experiences include an element of pleasure (along with the other elements specific to each activity, such as the experience of the texture of the food and the melody of the music). By itself, this definition enables Hedonists to make an argument that is close to perfectly circular. Defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience and well-being as all and only experiences that are intrinsically valuable allows a Hedonist to all but stipulate that Prudential Hedonism is the correct theory of well-being. Where defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is not circular is in its stipulation that only experiences matter for well-being. Some well-known objections to this idea are discussed below.

Another problem with defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is that the definition does not tell us very much about what pleasure is or how it can be identified. For example, knowing that pleasure is intrinsically valuable experience would not help someone to work out if a particular experience was intrinsically or just instrumentally valuable. Hedonists have attempted to respond to this problem by explaining how to find out whether an experience is intrinsically valuable.

One method is to ask yourself if you would like the experience to continue for its own sake (rather than because of what it might lead to). Wanting an experience to continue for its own sake reveals that you find it to be intrinsically valuable. While still making a coherent theory of well-being, defining intrinsically valuable experiences as those you want to perpetuate makes the theory much less hedonistic. The fact that what a person wants is the main criterion for something having intrinsic value, makes this kind of theory more in line with preference satisfaction theories of well-being. The central claim of preference satisfaction theories of well-being is that some variant of getting what one wants, or should want, under certain conditions is the only thing that intrinsically improves one’s well-being.

Another method of fleshing out the definition of pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is to describe how intrinsically valuable experiences feel. This method remains a hedonistic one, but seems to fall back into defining pleasure as a sensation.

It has also been argued that what makes an experience intrinsically valuable is that you like or enjoy it for its own sake. Hedonists arguing for this definition of pleasure usually take pains to position their definition in between the realms of sensation and preference satisfaction. They argue that since we can like or enjoy some experiences without concurrently wanting them or feeling any particular sensation, then liking is distinct from both sensation and preference satisfaction. Liking and enjoyment are also difficult terms to define in more detail, but they are certainly easier to recognise than the rather opaque “intrinsically valuable experience.”

Merely defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience and intrinsically valuable experiences as those that we like or enjoy still lacks enough detail to be very useful for contemplating well-being. A potential method for making this theory more useful would be to draw on the cognitive sciences to investigate if there is a specific neurological function for liking or enjoying. Cognitive science has not reached the point where anything definitive can be said about this, but a few neuroscientists have experimental evidence that liking and wanting (at least in regards to food) are neurologically distinct processes in rats and have argued that it should be the same for humans. The same scientists have wondered if the same processes govern all of our liking and wanting, but this question remains unresolved.

Most Hedonists who describe pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience believe that pleasure is internal and conscious. Hedonists who define pleasure in this way may be either Quantitative or Qualitative Hedonists, depending on whether they think that quality is a relevant dimension of how intrinsically valuable we find certain experiences.

d. Pleasure as Pro-Attitude

One of the most recent developments in modern hedonism is the rise of defining pleasure as a pro-attitude – a positive psychological stance toward some object. Any account of Prudential Hedonism that defines pleasure as a pro-attitude is referred to as Attitudinal Hedonism because it is a person’s attitude that dictates whether anything has intrinsic value. Positive psychological stances include approving of something, thinking it is good, and being pleased about it. The object of the positive psychological stance could be a physical object, such as a painting one is observing, but it could also be a thought, such as “my country is not at war,” or even a sensation. An example of a pro-attitude towards a sensation could be being pleased about the fact that an ice cream tastes so delicious.

Fred Feldman, the leading proponent of Attitudinal Hedonism, argues that the sensation of pleasure only has instrumental value – it only brings about value if you also have a positive psychological stance toward that sensation. In addition to his basic Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism, which is a form of Quantitative Hedonism, Feldman has also developed many variants that are types of Qualitative Hedonism. For example, Desert-Adjusted Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism, which reduces the intrinsic value a pro-attitude has for our well-being based on the quality of deservedness (that is, on the extent to which the particular object deserves a pro-attitude or not). For example, Desert-Adjusted Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism might stipulate that sensations of pleasure arising from adulterous behavior do not deserve approval, and so assign them no value.

Defining pleasure as a pro-attitude, while maintaining that all sensations of pleasure have no intrinsic value, makes Attitudinal Hedonism less obviously hedonistic as the versions that define pleasure as a sensation. Indeed, defining pleasure as a pro-attitude runs the risk of creating a preference satisfaction account of well-being because being pleased about something without feeling any pleasure seems hard to distinguish from having a preference for that thing.

5. Contemporary Objections

a. Pleasure is Not the Only Source of Intrinsic Value

The most common argument against Prudential Hedonism is that pleasure is not the only thing that intrinsically contributes to well-being. Living in reality, finding meaning in life, producing noteworthy achievements, building and maintaining friendships, achieving perfection in certain domains, and living in accordance with religious or moral laws are just some of the other things thought to intrinsically add value to our lives. When presented with these apparently valuable aspects of life, Hedonists usually attempt to explain their apparent value in terms of pleasure. A Hedonist would argue, for example, that friendship is not valuable in and of itself, rather it is valuable to the extent that it brings us pleasure. Furthermore, to answer why we might help a friend even when it harms us, a Hedonist will argue that the prospect of future pleasure from receiving reciprocal favors from our friend, rather than the value of friendship itself, should motivate us to help in this way.

Those who object to Prudential Hedonism on the grounds that pleasure is not the only source of intrinsic value use two main strategies. In the first strategy, objectors make arguments that some specific value cannot be reduced to pleasure. In the second strategy, objectors cite very long lists of apparently intrinsically valuable aspects of life and then challenge hedonists with the prolonged and arduous task of trying to explain how the value of all of them can be explained solely by reference to pleasure and the avoidance of pain. This second strategy gives good reason to be a pluralist about value because the odds seem to be against any monistic theory of value, such as Prudential Hedonism. The first strategy, however, has the ability to show that Prudential Hedonism is false, rather than being just unlikely to be the best theory of well-being.

The most widely cited argument for pleasure not being the only source of intrinsic value is based on Robert Nozick’s experience machine thought-experiment. Nozick’s experience machine thought-experiment was designed to show that more than just our experiences matter to us because living in reality also matters to us. This argument has proven to be so convincing that nearly every single book on ethics that discusses hedonism rejects it using only this argument or this one and one other.

In the thought experiment, Nozick asks us to imagine that we have the choice of plugging in to a fantastic machine that flawlessly provides an amazing mix of experiences. Importantly, this machine can provide these experiences in a way that, once plugged in to the machine, no one can tell that their experiences are not real. Disregarding considerations about responsibilities to others and the problems that would arise if everyone plugged in, would you plug in to the machine for life? The vast majority of people reject the choice to live a much more pleasurable life in the machine, mostly because they agree with Nozick that living in reality seems to be important for our well-being. Opinions differ on what exactly about living in reality is so much better for us than the additional pleasure of living in the experience machine, but the most common response is that a life that is not lived in reality is pointless or meaningless.

Since this argument has been used so extensively (from the mid 1970’s onwards) to dismiss Prudential Hedonism, several attempts have been made to refute it. Most commonly, Hedonists argue that living an experience machine life would be better than living a real life and that most people are simply mistaken to not want to plug in. Some go further and try to explain why so many people choose not to plug in. Such explanations often point out that the most obvious reasons for not wanting to plug in can be explained in terms of expected pleasure and avoidance of pain. For example, it might be argued that we expect to get pleasure from spending time with our real friends and family, but we do not expect to get as much pleasure from the fake friends or family we might have in the experience machine. These kinds of attempts to refute the experience machine objection do little to persuade non-Hedonists that they have made the wrong choice.

A more promising line of defence for the Prudential Hedonists is to provide evidence that there is a particular psychological bias that affects most people’s choice in the experience machine thought experiment. A reversal of Nozick’s thought experiment has been argued to reveal just such a bias. Imagine that a credible source tells you that you are actually in an experience machine right now. You have no idea what reality would be like. Given the choice between having your memory of this conversation wiped and going to reality, what would be best for you to choose? Empirical evidence on this choice shows that most people would choose to stay in the experience machine. Comparing this result with how people respond to Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment reveals the following: In Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment people tend to choose a real and familiar life over a more pleasurable life and in the reversed experience machine thought experiment people tend to choose a familiar life over a real life. Familiarity seems to matter more than reality, undermining the strength of Nozick’s original argument. The bias thought to be responsible for this difference is the status quo bias – an irrational preference for the familiar or for things to stay as they are.

Regardless of whether Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment is as decisive a refutation of Prudential Hedonism as it is often thought to be, the wider argument (that living in reality is valuable for our well-being) is still a problem for Prudential Hedonists. That our actions have real consequences, that our friends are real, and that our experiences are genuine seem to matter for most of us regardless of considerations of pleasure. Unfortunately, we lack a trusted methodology for discerning if these things should matter to us. Perhaps the best method for identifying intrinsically valuable aspects of lives is to compare lives that are equal in pleasure and all other important ways, except that one aspect of one of the lives is increased. Using this methodology, however, seems certain to lead to an artificial pluralist conclusion about what has value. This is because any increase in a potentially valuable aspect of our lives will be viewed as a free bonus. And, most people will choose the life with the free bonus just in case it has intrinsic value, not necessarily because they think it does have intrinsic value.

b. Some Pleasure is Not Valuable

The main traditional line of criticism against Prudential Hedonism is that not all pleasure is valuable for well-being, or at least that some pleasures are less valuable than others because of non-amount-related factors. Some versions of this criticism are much easier for Prudential Hedonists to deal with than others depending on where the allegedly disvaluable aspect of the pleasure resides. If the disvaluable aspect is experienced with the pleasure itself, then both Qualitative and Quantitative varieties of Prudential Hedonism have sufficient answers to these problems. If, however, the disvaluable aspect of the pleasure is never experienced, then all types of Prudential Hedonism struggle to explain why the allegedly disvaluable aspect is irrelevant.

Examples of the easier criticisms to deal with are that Prudential Hedonism values, or at least overvalues, perverse and base pleasures. These kinds of criticisms tend to have had more sway in the past and doubtless encouraged Mill to develop his Qualitative Hedonism. In response to the charge that Prudential Hedonism mistakenly values pleasure from sadistic torture, sating hunger, copulating, listening to opera, and philosophising all equally, Qualitative Hedonists can simply deny that it does. Since pleasure from sadistic torture will normally be experienced as containing the quality of sadism (just as the pleasure from listening to good opera is experienced as containing the quality of acoustic excellence), the Qualitative Hedonist can plausibly claim to be aware of the difference in quality and allocate less value to perverse or base pleasures accordingly.

Prudential Hedonists need not relinquish the Quantitative aspect of their theory in order to deal with these criticisms, however. Quantitative Hedonists, can simply point out that moral or cultural values are not necessarily relevant to well-being because the investigation of well-being aims to understand what the good life for the one living it is and what intrinsically makes their life go better for them. A Quantitative Hedonist can simply respond that a sadist that gets sadistic pleasure from torturing someone does improve their own well-being (assuming that the sadist never feels any negative emotions or gets into any other trouble as a result). Similarly, a Quantitative Hedonist can argue that if someone genuinely gets a lot of pleasure from porcine company and wallowing in the mud, but finds opera thoroughly dull, then we have good reason to think that having to live in a pig sty would be better for her well-being than forcing her to listen to opera.

Much more problematic for both Quantitative and Qualitative Hedonists, however, are the more modern versions of the criticism that not all pleasure is valuable. The modern versions of this criticism tend to use examples in which the disvaluable aspect of the pleasure is never experienced by the person whose well-being is being evaluated. The best example of these modern criticisms is a thought experiment devised by Shelly Kagan. Kagan’s deceived businessman thought experiment is widely thought to show that pleasures of a certain kind, namely false pleasures, are worth much less than true pleasures.

Kagan asks us to imagine the life of a very successful businessman who takes great pleasure in being respected by his colleagues, well-liked by his friends, and loved by his wife and children until the day he died. Then Kagan asks us to compare this life with one of equal length and the same amount of pleasure (experienced as coming from exactly the same sources), except that in each case the businessman is mistaken about how those around him really feel. This second (deceived) businessman experiences just as much pleasure from the respect of his colleagues and the love of his family as the first businessman. The only difference is that the second businessman has many false beliefs. Specifically, the deceived businessman’s colleagues actually think he is useless, his wife doesn’t really love him, and his children are only nice to him so that he will keep giving them money. Given that the deceived businessman never knew of any of these deceptions and his experiences were never negatively impacted by the deceptions indirectly, which life do you think is better?

Nearly everyone thinks that the deceived businessman has a worse life. This is a problem for Prudential Hedonists because the pleasure is quantitatively equal in each life, so they should be equally good for the one living it. Qualitative Hedonism does not seem to be able to avoid this criticism either because the falsity of the pleasures experienced by the deceived businessman is a dimension of the pleasure that he never becomes aware of. Theoretically, an externalist and qualitative version of Attitudinal Hedonism could include the falsity dimension of an instance of pleasure even if the falsity dimension never impacts the consciousness of the person. However, the resulting definition of pleasure bears little resemblance to what we commonly understand pleasure to be and also seems to be ad hoc in its inclusion of the truth dimension but not others. A dedicated Prudential Hedonist of any variety can always stubbornly stick to the claim that the lives of the two businessmen are of equal value, but that will do little to convince the vast majority to take Prudential Hedonism more seriously.

c. There is No Coherent and Unifying Definition of Pleasure

Another major line of criticism used against Prudential Hedonists is that they have yet to come up with a meaningful definition of pleasure that unifies the seemingly disparate array of pleasures while remaining recognisable as pleasure. Some definitions lack sufficient detail to be informative about what pleasure actually is, or why it is valuable, and those that do offer enough detail to be meaningful are faced with two difficult tasks.

The first obstacle for a useful definition of pleasure for hedonism is to unify all of the diverse pleasures in a reasonable way. Phenomenologically, the pleasure from reading a good book is very different to the pleasure from bungee jumping, and both of these pleasures are very different to the pleasure of having sex. This obstacle is unsurpassable for most versions of Quantitative Hedonism because it makes the value gained from different pleasures impossible to compare. Not being able to compare different types of pleasure results in being unable to say if a life is better than another in most even vaguely realistic cases. Furthermore, not being able to compare lives means that Quantitative Hedonism could not be usefully used to guide behavior since it cannot instruct us on which life to aim for.

Attempts to resolve the problem of unifying the different pleasures while remaining within a framework of Quantitative Hedonism, usually involve pointing out something that is constant in all of the disparate pleasures and defining that particular thing as pleasure. When pleasure is defined as a strict sensation, this strategy fails because introspection reveals that no such sensation exists. Pleasure defined as the experience of liking or as a pro-attitude does much better at unifying all of the diverse pleasures. However, defining pleasure in these ways makes the task of filling in the details of the theory a fine balancing act. Liking or pro-attitudes must be described in such a way that they are not solely a sensation or best described as a preference satisfaction theory. And they must perform this balancing act while still describing a scientifically plausible and conceptually coherent account of pleasure. Most attempts to define pleasure as liking or pro-attitudes seem to disagree with either the folk conception of what pleasure is or any of the plausible scientific conceptions of how pleasure functions.

Most varieties of Qualitative Hedonism do better at dealing with the problem of diverse pleasures because they can evaluate different pleasures according to their distinct qualities. Qualitative Hedonists still need a coherent method for comparing the different pleasures with each other in order to be more than just an abstract theory of well-being, however. And, it is difficult to construct such a methodology in a way that avoids counter examples, while still describing a scientifically plausible and conceptually coherent account of pleasure.

The second obstacle is creating a definition of pleasure that retains at least some of the core properties of the common understanding of the term ‘pleasure’. As mentioned, many of the potential adjustments to the main definitions of pleasure are useful for avoiding one or more of the many objections against Prudential Hedonism. The problem with this strategy is that the more adjustments that are made, the more apparent it becomes that the definition of pleasure is not recognisable as the pleasure that gave Hedonism its distinctive intuitive plausibility in the first place. When an instance of pleasure is defined simply as when someone feels good, its intrinsic value for well-being is intuitively obvious. However, when the definition of pleasure is stretched, so as to more effectively argue that all valuable experiences are pleasurable, it becomes much less recognisable as the concept of pleasure we use in day-to-day life and its intrinsic value becomes much less intuitive.

6. The Future of Hedonism

The future of hedonism seems bleak. The considerable number and strength of the arguments against Prudential Hedonism’s central principle (that pleasure and only pleasure intrinsically contributes positively to well-being and the opposite for pain) seem insurmountable. Hedonists have been creative in their definitions of pleasure so as to avoid these objections, but more often than not find themselves defending a theory that is not particularly hedonistic, realistic or both.

Perhaps the only hope that Hedonists of all types can have for the future is that advances in cognitive science will lead to a better understanding of how pleasure works in the brain and how biases affect our judgements about thought experiments. If our improved understanding in these areas confirms a particular theory about what pleasure is and also provides reasons to doubt some of the widespread judgements about the thought experiments that make the vast majority of philosophers reject hedonism, then hedonism might experience at least a partial revival. The good news for Hedonists is that at least some emerging theories and results from cognitive science do appear to support some aspects of hedonism.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Bentham, Jeremy (1789). An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, First printed in 1780 and first published in 1789. A corrected edition with extra footnotes and paragraphs at the end was published in 1823. Recent edition: Adamant Media Corporation, 2005.
- Bentham’s main discussion of his Quantitative Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
Blake, R. M. (1926). Why Not Hedonism? A Protest, International Journal of Ethics, 37(1): 1-18.
- An excellent refutation of G. E. Moore’s main arguments against hedonism.
Crisp, Roger (2006). Reasons and the Good, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Discusses the importance of ultimate reasons and argues that the best of these do not use moral concepts. The volume also defends Prudential Hedonism, especially Chapter 4.
Crisp, R. (2006). Hedonism Reconsidered, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, LXXIII(3): 619-645.
- Essentially the same as Chapter 4 from his Reasons and the Good.
De Brigard, F. (2010). If You Like it, Does it Matter if it’s Real?, Philosophical Psychology, 23(1): 43-57.
- Presents empirical evidence that the experience machine thought experiment is heavily affected by a psychological bias.
Feldman, Fred (1997). Utilitarianism, Hedonism, and Desert: Essays in Moral Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Contains a mixture of topics relevant to hedonism, including modern and ancient theories and objections. There is a detailed section on adjusting pleasure to take deservedness into account (Part III).
Feldman, Fred (2004). Pleasure and the Good Life, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- The best and most detailed account of Attitudinal Hedonism. This volume also includes a very detailed account of how Prudential Hedonism should be defined.
Kagan, Shelly (1998). Chapter 2: The Good, in his Normative Ethics, Oxford: Westview Press, pp. 25-69.
- See especially pp. 34-36 for the first discussion of the Deceived Businessman thought experiment.
Kawall, J. (1999). The Experience Machine and Mental State Theories of Well-being, The Journal of Value Inquiry, 33: 381-387.
- An excellent article about the strengths and weaknesses of the experience machine thought experiment as it is used against hedonism.
Kringelbach, Morten L. & Berridge, Kent B. (eds.) (2010). Pleasures of the Brain, Oxford University Press.
- This edited volume collects papers from the leading experts on pleasure from the disciplines of psychology and neuroscience. Perhaps of most value is a chapter at the front of the book in which the experts all answer a standard set of questions posed by the editors. The questions include: “Is pleasure necessarily a conscious feeling?”, “Is pleasure simply a sensation, like sweetness?”, and “Is there a common currency for all sensory pleasures… [o]r are different sensory pleasures mediated by different neural circuits?” The experts answers to these questions is the perfect starting point for a philosopher looking to find out more about pleasure from cognitive science.
Mill, John Stuart (1861). Utilitarianism, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1957.
- Mill’s main discussion of his Qualitative Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
Moore, George E. (1903). Principia Ethica, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- See especially Chapter 3 on hedonism, which contains Moore’s influential arguments against hedonism.
Nozick, R. (1974). Anarchy, State, and Utopia, Oxford: Blackwell, 1991.
- See especially pp. 42-45 for the first discussion of the experience machine thought experiment.
Plato (1937). Philebus, in The Dialogues of Plato, trans. by B. Jowett, New York: Random House.
- See especially Part ii, p. 353 for the oyster example.
Plato (1974). Book II: Preliminaries, in The Republic, trans. by Desmond Lee, second edition (revised), Penguin Books, 1983.
- Original discussion of the Ring of Gyges example.
Sobel, D. (1999). Pleasure as a Mental State, Utilitas, 11(2): 230-234.
- Argues against the viability of defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience.
Sobel, D. (2002). Varieties of Hedonism, Journal of Social Philosophy, 33(2): 240-256.
- Describes some of the main types of Prudential Hedonism and the problems with them.
Tännsjö, T. (1998). Hedonistic Utilitarianism, Edinburgh University Press.
- Tännsjö endorses unconscious pleasures as being valuable, an unusual contemporary position. This book can be difficult to acquire.
Tännsjö, T. (2007). Narrow Hedonism, Journal of Happiness Studies, 8:79-98.
- Worth a look if you do not have access to his Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
Weijers, D. (2011). Intuitive Biases in Judgements about Thought Experiments: The Experience Machine Revisited, Philosophical Writings, 50 & 51.
- An explanation of how psychological biases can affect our judgements about thought experiments using the experience machine thought experiment as an example.

b. Secondary and Mixed Sources

Gunaratna. Tarkarahasyadīpika. Cārvāka/Lokāyata: an Anthology of Source Materials and Some Recent Studies. Ed. Debiprasad Chattopadhyaya. New Delhi: Indian Council of Philosophical Research in association with Rddhi-India Calcutta, 1990.
- An anthology of primary source materials on the Cārvāka with some more recent analysis.
Inwood, B., & Gerson, L. P. (eds.) (1994). The Epicurus Reader: Selected Writings and Testimonia. Indianapolis, Hackett Publishing.
- An inexpensive collection that has most of the major extant writings of Epicurus, in addition to other ancient sources such as Cicero and Plutarch who wrote about Epicureanism. However, there is little commentary or explication of the material, and some of the primary sources are fairly opaque. Unusually, the writing of Lucretius does not feature much in this collection.
Laertius, Diogenes (1925) Aristippus, in Volume I, Book II of his Lives of the Philosophers, trans. by R. D. Hicks, The Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press.
Laertius, Diogenes (1925) Epicurus, in Volume II, Book X of Lives of Eminent Philosophers, trans. by R. D. Hicks, The Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press.
Mitsis, Phillip (1988). Epicurus’ Ethical Theory: The Pleasures of Invulnerability, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
- Covers all of the major areas of Epicurean ethics, from pleasure, to friendship, justice, and human freedom. Mitsis is especially good at showing how Epicurus’ conception of pleasure differs from that of the more modern Utilitarians.
O’Keefe, Tim (2002). The Cyrenaics on Pleasure, Happiness, and Future-Concern, Phronesis, 47(4), pp. 395-416.
- Explores the question of why the Cyrenaics, alone among ancient Greek ethical theorists, claim that happiness is not the highest good, but particular pleasures are instead, and that one should not worry about the long-term consequences of one’s actions but instead concentrate on obtaining pleasures that are near at hand.
Smith, James and Sosa, Ernest (eds.) (1969). Mill’s Utilitarianism: Text and Criticism, Belmont CA: Wadsworth.
- A great collection of Mill’s writing and commentaries on it by Mill scholars. The volume also includes an extensive section on suggested further reading. The Further reading section is helpfully broken down by which of Mill’s essays they are most relevant to.
West, Henry R. (ed.) (2006). The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism, Oxford: Blackwell.
- A collection of essays on different aspects of Mill’s Hedonistic Utilitarianism and the relevant original passages from Mill. See especially Chapter 4, Wendy Donner’s article, Mill’s Theory of Value.

Author Information

Dan Weijers
Email: danweijers@gmail.com
Victoria University of Wellington
New Zealand

The Safety Condition for Knowledge

A number of epistemologists have defended a necessary condition for knowledge that has come to be labeled as the “safety” condition. Timothy Williamson, Duncan Pritchard, and Ernest Sosa are the foremost defenders of safety. According to these authors an agent S knows a true proposition P only if S could not easily have falsely believed P. Disagreement arises, however, with respect to how they capture the notion of a safe belief.

Unlike Pritchard and Sosa, who have gone on to incorporate the safety condition into a virtue account of knowledge, Williamson distances himself from the project of offering reductive analyses of knowledge. Williamson’s project can best be thought of as an illumination of the structural features of knowledge by way of safety. The maneuvers of Pritchard and Sosa into the domain of virtue epistemology are not discussed here.

This article is a treatment of the different presentations and defenses of the safety condition for knowledge. Special attention is first paid to an elucidation of the various aspects or features of the safety condition. Following a short demonstration, of the manner in which the safety condition handles some rather tough Gettier-like cases in the literature, some problems facing safety conclude this article.

Historical Background
The Safety Condition as a Necessary Condition for Knowledge
Elucidating the Safety Condition
Safety in Action
Problems for Safety
References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

Knowledge is incompatible with accidentally true belief. That is to say, if an agent S is lucky that her belief P is true, S does not know P. This feature of knowledge was made explicit by Bertrand Russell (1948: 170) and, more famously, by Edmund Gettier (1963) who demonstrated that a justified true belief (JTB) is insufficient for knowledge. Gettier provided us with cases in which there is strong intuitive pull towards the judgment that S can have a justified true belief P yet not know P because S is lucky that S’s belief P is true. To use Russell’s case, suppose S truly believes it’s noon as a result of looking at a clock that correctly reads noon. However, unbeknownst to S this clock broke exactly twelve hours prior. Even though S has good reasons to believe it’s noon and S’s belief is true, S does not know it’s noon since S is lucky that her belief is true.

Several notable attempts were made to improve the JTB analysis of knowledge; in particular, some were attracted to the idea that a stronger justification condition would resolve Gettier problems (Shope 1983: 45-108). Thus began the vast literature on the nature of epistemic justification. Others, though disagreeing among themselves about the place of justification in an account of knowledge, sought a solution to the Gettier problem in a new anti-luck condition for knowledge. (The majority of these accounts dropped the justification requirement.) One of these attempts is particularly relevant here. Fred Dretske (1970) and Robert Nozick (1981) proposed accounts of knowledge central to which were a counterfactual condition, Nozick’s being the more popular of the two. Nozick proposed the following counterfactual as a necessary condition for knowledge (1981: 179): S knows P via a method M only if, were P false, S would not believe P via M [¬P ☐→ ¬B(P)]. This came to be termed the sensitivity condition for knowledge. To satisfy this condition it must be the case that in the closest world in which P is false S does not believe P. That is, S must track the truth of P to know P (where possible worlds are ordered as per their similarity to the actual world).

Nozick’s account enjoyed widespread popularity because of its anti-skeptical capabilities. Following Nozick, I count as knowing that there is tree in my garden since I would not believe that if none were planted there, that is, in the closest world in which there is no tree in my garden (for example, when none is planted there), I do not believe that there is a tree in my garden. Worlds where radically skeptical scenarios are true count as further off since those worlds are more dissimilar to the actual world than the world in which no tree is planted in my garden. That I would believe falsely in those worlds is thus irrelevant. In other words, that I would falsely believe in such a far off world is inconsequential to whether I believe truly in the actual world.

Nozick’s account came with two significant costs, however. Firstly, it cannot accommodate the very intuitive principle that knowledge is closed under known entailment. Roughly, this principle states that if S knows P and S knows that P entails Q then S knows Q. It follows, then, that if I know that I have hands, and I know that if I have hands entails that I am not a handless brain in the vat, then I know that I am not a handless brain in the vat. However, I fail to know that I am not a handless brain in the vat since I would falsely believe I was not a handless brain in the vat in the closest world in which the proposition “I am not a handless brain in the vat” is false (that is, the world in which I am a handless brain in the vat). In other words, the sensitivity condition for knowledge cannot be satisfied when it comes to the denial of radically skeptical hypotheses. Seeing no way to redeem his account from this problem, Nozick (1981: 198ff) was forced into the rather unorthodox position of having to deny the universal applicability of closure as a feature of knowledge.

Secondly, Nozick admits that the sensitivity condition cannot feature as a condition for knowledge of necessarily true propositions as there is no world in which such propositions are false since, by definition, necessarily true propositions are true in every possible world. The scope of the sensitivity condition is thus limited to knowledge of contingently true propositions. That the sensitivity condition cannot, for example, illuminate the nature of our mathematical or logical knowledge makes it less preferable, ceteris paribus, than a condition that can.

At the end of the twentieth century and the beginning of the twenty-first, several authors proposed a novel and relatively similar condition for knowledge that has come to be known as the safety condition, the elucidation of which being the objective here. As the relevant features of the safety condition are presented and explained, the following salient points will emerge. The safety condition is similar to the sensitivity condition in that it too is a modal condition for knowledge. That’s where any significant similarity ends. As shall be demonstrated at length, safety differs from sensitivity in the following ways. Firstly, and most importantly, safety permits knowing the denial of a radically skeptical hypothesis in a manner that maintains the closure principle. This advantage by itself acts as a strong point in favor of the safety condition. Secondly, most formulations of the safety condition are not in the form of a counterfactual. Thirdly, the safety condition is more expansive than the sensitivity condition in that its scope includes knowledge of both necessarily true and contingently true propositions. Lastly, epistemologists since then generally believe the safety condition opens the way to a more enlightened response to skepticism.

2. The Safety Condition as a Necessary Condition for Knowledge

The literature on the safety condition is challenging for even the seasoned philosopher. Seeing that Williamson, Pritchard, and Sosa have developed their thoughts over a lengthy period of time and in a large number of publications, it has become quite a task to keep track of the epicycles in the conceptual development and defense of the safety condition. Additionally, each of its advocates is motivated to formulate the safety condition in a distinct way, where even slight differences in formulation make for significant conceptual divergence. In light of these considerations, it is best to begin with a separate treatment of each author’s presentation of the safety condition before proceeding to an overall elucidation of the safety condition.

a. Timothy Williamson

Williamson (2000) is involved in the project of illuminating several structural features of knowledge. His safety condition is both the result of this project and an integral part of it.

Williamson, in stark opposition to the standard practice in the post-Gettier period, resists being drawn into offering a conceptual analysis of knowledge in terms of non-trivial and non-circular necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for knowledge, a project he thinks is futile given its history of repetitive failures. Knowledge, for Williamson, requires avoidance of error in similar cases. This is to be taken as a schema by which to elucidate the structural features of knowledge. The basic idea, then, is that S knows P only if S is safe from error; that is, there must be no risk or danger that S believes falsely in a similar case. The relevant modal notions of safety, risk, and danger are cashed out in terms of possible worlds such that there is no close world surrounding the actual world in which S falls into error: “safety is a sort of local necessity” (Williamson 2009d: 14). These possible worlds in which S truly believes P act as a kind of “buffer zone” from error and thereby prevent the type of epistemic luck that characterize Gettier cases. In Russell’s case, for example, S does not know that it’s noon since there is a close world in which S falsely believes that it’s noon, for instance, one in which S looks at the clock slightly before or after noon.

Despite Williamson’s opposition to the project of analyzing knowledge into non-trivial necessary and sufficient conditions, it seems clear enough that Williamson should be read as putting forward safety as a necessary condition for knowledge given that he presents the safety condition as a conditional using the appropriate locution only if. And this is how his critics typically interpret him. As Williamson formulates the safety condition in a number of different ways on different occasions, it is impossible to pin down one formulation as representing Williamson’s view. Here is one formulation that will suffice for the time being:

(SF) If one knows, one could not easily have been wrong in a similar case (2000: 147)

Nevertheless, the manner in which Williamson expresses the safety condition still separates him from those who offer necessary conditions for knowledge. As Williamson emphasizes time and again, the safety condition, as he states it, is to be taken as a circular necessary condition in that whether or not a case β counts as a relevantly similar case to α is in part determined by whether we are inclined to attribute knowledge to the agent in α; safety (reliability in similar enough cases) cannot be defined without reference to knowledge, and knowledge without reference to safety (2000: 100; 2009d: 9-10). Safety, by Williamson’s lights is thus not to be taken as a recipe by which to determine whether or not the agent is to be attributed knowledge in each and every case. Rather, it is a model by which to illuminate the structural features of knowledge and by which we can begin talking about knowledge in individual cases. As Williamson observes, “the point of the safety conception of knowing is not to enable one to determine whether a knowledge attribution is true in a given case by applying one’s general understanding of safety, without reference to knowing itself. If one tried to do that, one would very likely get it wrong” (2009d: ibid.).

b. Duncan Pritchard

Pritchard is attracted to the idea that a conceptual analysis of our concept “luck” will yield sufficient insight from which to build a satisfactory anti-luck condition for knowledge. In other words, with a conceptual mastery of the nature of luck in hand, the problem of epistemic luck can, in theory, be overcome. Pritchard’s safety condition is thus formulated in a manner which reflects his work on the conceptual analysis of luck.

For Pritchard (2005: 128) an event E counts as lucky for an agent S if and only if E is significant to S and E obtains in the actual world but does not obtain in a wide class of nearby possible worlds in which the relevant initial conditions for that event are the same as in the actual world. For example, one is lucky not to be killed by a sniper’s bullet since in the actual world the bullet misses but it does not miss in the close worlds. Importantly, luck comes in degrees. One naturally counts as lucky if the sniper missed by a meter. But one counts as luckier if the sniper missed by a centimeter. The agent counts as luckier in the latter case, claims Pritchard (2009b: 39), because the world in which one is killed in that case is much closer to the actual world than the world in which one is killed in the former case (since the second sniper is better). Close worlds, then, can be roughly divided into two classes—near and non-near, and are to be weighted accordingly—the near close worlds count for more than the non-near close worlds.

The foregoing analysis of luck motivates the following analysis of epistemic luck: S is very lucky that her belief P is true in the actual world if P is false in at least one of the near close worlds. And S is lucky, but not as lucky, that her belief P is true if P is true in the actual world but false in at least one of the non-near close worlds. Stated otherwise, false belief in a very close world is incompatible with knowledge while false belief in a non-near close world is compatible with knowledge. Here is a formulation of the safety condition by Pritchard (2007, 2008, 2009a) as a non-circular necessary condition in a standard account of knowledge:

(SF*) S’s belief is safe if and only if in most nearby possible worlds in which S continues to form her belief about the target proposition in the same way as in the actual world, and in all very close nearby possible worlds in which S continues to form her belief about the target proposition in the same way as in the actual world, the belief continues to be true.

That is to say, as long as S truly believes P using the same method in all of the very close worlds and in nearly all of the non-near close worlds, S’s belief P is safe. Accordingly, the agent in Russell’s case fails to know that it’s noon since there is a very close world in which she falsely believes that it’s noon, for example, the very close world in which that clock stops slightly before or after noon.

Pritchard’s focus is knowledge of contingently true propositions. However, Pritchard (2009a: 34) claims that to extend the safety condition to handle knowledge of a necessarily true proposition P, which is true in all possible worlds, his safety condition can easily be augmented in such a way as to require that S not falsely believe a different proposition Q in a very close world and nearly all non-near close worlds using the same method that S used in the actual world.

Of the many ways in which Pritchard’s condition differs from Williamson’s, it is evident that they differ in one very important respect: Pritchard’s condition permits relatively few cases of falsely believing P in non-near close worlds. Pritchard is motivated to make this concession since his safety condition is informed by his account of luck, which counts S lucky vis-à-vis an event E even though E occurs in some non-near close worlds. Williamson’s condition, by contrast, has a zero tolerance policy for false belief in any close world.

c. Ernest Sosa

Sosa arrives at his formulation of the safety condition as a necessary condition for knowledge by way of working through some of the fundamental shortcomings he identifies in Goldman’s relevant alternatives condition and Nozick’s sensitivity condition. As Sosa puts it, both Goldman and Nozick failed to adequately capture the way in which the proposition believed must be modally related to the truth of that proposition. For Sosa, an agent S counts as knowing P only if S believes P by way of a safe method or, in Sosa’s words, a safe “indication” or “deliverance.”

Sosa’s formulation of the safety condition differs from both Williamson’s and Pritchard’s in that it is stipulated in the form of the following counterfactual (1999a: 146):

(SF**) If S were to believe P, P would be true [B(P) ☐→ P]

The following short note on counterfactuals helps explain the logic of (SF**). Firstly, according to Lewis’s semantics for counterfactuals (1973), a counterfactual of the form P ☐→ Q is true at a world W only if some world in which P and Q are true is closer to W than any world in which P is true but Q false. Since Lewis thinks that the closest world to W is W itself, the counterfactual P → Q is trivially true at W if P and Q are both true at W. Accordingly, when the antecedent of a counterfactual is true, it follows that P & Q entails P ☐→ Q. Nozick (1981: 176, 680 n.8) finds this result untenable and rejects Lewisian semantics for counterfactuals with true antecedents. Sosa concurs with Nozick. On their semantics for counterfactuals with true antecedents, the counterfactual B(P) ☐→ P is true at a world W if and only if S truly believes P by method M in W and in all close worlds in which S believes P by method M, P is true. It follows, then, that like (SF) and unlike (SF*), Sosa’s condition entails zero tolerance for false belief in any close world.

Secondly, though remarkably similar to the sensitivity condition, (SF**) is not logically equivalent to the sensitivity condition [¬P ☐→ ¬B(P)] since contraposition is invalid for counterfactuals. The following example, from Lewis (1973: 35) demonstrates that contraposition (A→B) ↔ (¬B → ¬ A) is invalid for counterfactuals. Consider the following counterfactual: (A) If Boris had gone to the party, then Olga would still have gone. It should be clear that (A) is not equivalent to its contraposition (B) If Olga had not gone to the party then Boris would still not have gone, because althoughwhile (A) is true (B) is false since Boris would have gone had Olga been absent from the party.

In light of these considerations about counterfactuals, Sosa’s formulation of safety explains why the agent in Russell’s case lacks knowledge. Since there is a close world in which he uses the same method as he does in the actual world at a slightly earlier or later time, namely consulting a broken clock, and thereby comes to falsely believe it to be noon, his belief in the actual world is not safe.

Sosa has since moved on from defending a “brute” safety condition as a necessary condition for knowledge. Sosa (2007, 2009) argues that an agent’s belief must be apt and adroit to count as knowledge, where such virtues differ from safety considerations.

3. Elucidating the Safety Condition

The presentation of the safety condition thus far has been intentionally bare-boned for introductory purposes. This section is devoted to spelling out the finer details or characteristics of the condition, which is a rather challenging task given the presence of some vague patches in the safety literature.

It goes without saying that for epistemic purposes possible worlds W₁, …, W_N count as relevantly closer to or further from the world W in which S believes P at time T on a case by case basis relative to most or all of the following factors: the belief P, time T, the agent S, and the method M by which S formed the belief P at T in W. In other words, the conditions of belief formation, represented by the set {S, P, T, M}, play a constitutive, though not exclusive, role in a determination of closeness. (With respect to safety, one can either think of these possible worlds as branching possibilities à la Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio (2009) or as concentric circles surrounding a subject-centered world, as Lewis (1973: 149) does in his semantics for counterfactuals.) It follows, then, that the adequacy of the safety condition will turn on, among other things, how close worlds are to be specified, the time of the belief formation, what type of reliability is at play, and how safety theorists understand methods. A foray into these important questions follows.

a. What Counts as a Close World?

Before attempting to answer this important question, four points must be made. Firstly, to satisfy the safety condition it is not the case that in every close world the agent must truly believe the relevant proposition; that is to say, S can safely believe P in W even though there are close worlds in which the agent does not form the belief P, for example, where S does not believe the target proposition in several of the close worlds because S is distracted or preoccupied. For instance, in world W S comes to believe that a car is approaching when S sees a car coming down the road. There may very well be a close world in which S is standing in exactly that same position at that very time but does not form the belief that a car is approaching because S turns her head in the opposite direction to look at a squirrel in a tree. The lack of belief about the approaching car in these close worlds does not prevent S from safely believing in W that a car is approaching. In light of such considerations, it is useful to consider close worlds as divided into two broad categories—relevant and irrelevant—a distinction which will prove important in the discussion on skepticism. below.

Secondly, as Williamson points out (2000: 100), the safety condition is notoriously vague owing to knowledge and reliability being vague concepts. As such it is unlikely that we will arrive at a very determinate answer as to exactly which worlds count as close; our expectations must be lowered. The problems this vagueness generates will become evident in section 4.

Thirdly, as Hawthorne (2004: 56) notes, closeness, as it pertains to safety, cannot be cashed out in terms of the notion of similarity found in counterfactuals. A counterfactual of the form P ☐→ Q is non-vacuously true at a world W only if some world in which P and Q are true is closer to W than any world in which P is true but Q false. When determining the truth conditions for counterfactuals, the history of both the actual world and the close world in which the antecedent is true are held fixed. When it comes to safety, possible worlds with a different history to W can nevertheless count as close, as will become evident below. Additionally, unlike the similarity of two worlds for epistemic purposes, the similarity of worlds for the purposes of counterfactuals need not be agent-relative.

Lastly, it is unclear whether believing a truthvalueless proposition (for example, one that fails to refer) in a close world should count as a knowledge-denying error possibility. Hawthorne (2004: 56) thinks it should since these count as “failed attempts at a true belief.” None of the safety theorists discuss this type of case.

Now on to the four main determinants of closeness:

i. The Time Factor

As far as safety goes, two worlds W and W* may count as similar at a time T with respect to the set {S, P, M} yet count as distant from each another, with respect to that same set, at a time prior to or following T. Consequently, if S falsely believes P in W* at T, then S’s belief P in W at T is unsafe. The following two cases illustrate that for the purposes of safe belief closeness must be understood as indexed to a point in time.

Cases concerning knowledge of the future demonstrate that similarity between two worlds at the time of belief formation trumps dissimilarity at a later time. Suppose, for the sake of illustration, that in a world W at time T (sometime in May 2009) an agent S truly believes that London will host the 2012 Olympics as a result of reading so in a local newspaper. In many possible worlds S similarly believes as much from reading the paper. Yet in some of these worlds things in 2012 may be radically different from the way things will be in W in 2012 when the Olympics indeed take place in London. For example, in one of these worlds W* the British economy collapses and no Olympics take place in London in 2012. In W* S’s belief at T is thus false. Nonetheless, W and W* may count as close at T despite these significant differences between these two worlds in 2012 given how similar these two worlds are with respect to the set {S, M, P, T} i.e. the details of S’s belief episode at T in which she comes to believe that London will host the 2012 Olympics as a result of reading so in the newspaper.

It is not the case, however, that for a world W* to be close to world W at T it must share a complete history with W up to and including time T. The following case elucidates this point. It is taken for granted that if in W Sally walks into a showroom displaying red shoes under red overhead lights she does not know that there are red shoes on display if there is a close world W* in which there are white shoes on display but which look red under red lights. Notice that W* counts as close to W at T even though they do not share an identical history: at T-N, where N is some duration,thefactoryowner in W* is placing white shoes on the display shelves and turning red lights on.

Additionally, insisting on shared histories would make safety trivially true in some cases where the target proposition believed is true and concerns the present or the past; namely, were close worlds only those worlds which share complete histories with the actual world until the moment at which the belief is formed, then it would follow that in some cases the proposition believed would be trivially safe, which is an unacceptable consequence. Accordingly, if I recall going to the gym yesterday then I know I went to the gym yesterday only if there is no close world which differs from the actual world with respect to my going to the gym yesterday and in which I falsely believe I went to the gym yesterday.

There is room to think that the conceptual content of “could easily have falsely believed” permits playing around with the time of the belief formation itself. It stands to reason, then, cases of belief formation in a possible world W* which occur shortly before or after the belief formation in W should be factored into knowledge determinations as well. If S forms a false belief in those cases then S’s belief in W is unsafe. The motivation for permitting this flexibility with the time factor is that it allows safety to handle a wide variety of cases in which time is part of the content of the proposition believed, as exemplified by the Russell case. For example, S looks at two people kissing at a new year’s party and forms the true belief that it’s the new year. S does not count as knowing that it’s the new year if there is a close world in which just prior to midnight these two people begin kissing slightly before midnight, as a result of which S falsely believes it’s the new year.

ii. What Type of Reliability does Safety Require?

Reliability, as a property of a belief-forming method, comes in different kinds, two of which are important for the purpose at hand—local and global. The latter refers to a method M’s reliability in producing a range of token output beliefs in different propositions P, Q, R, …, and so forth. A method M is globally reliable if and only if it produces sufficiently more true beliefs than false beliefs in a range of different propositions. For example, M could be the visual process and P the proposition that there is a pencil on the desk, Q the proposition that there are clouds in the sky, and R the proposition that the bin is black. If a sufficiently high number of P, Q, R, … are true then method M is globally reliable. A method M is locally reliable with respect to an individual target belief P if and only if M produces a sufficient ratio of more true beliefs than false beliefs in that very proposition P.

Accounts of knowledge in the post-Gettier period differ with regards to which type of reliability is necessary for knowledge. Nozick and Dretske think only local reliability is needed, McGinn (1999) requires global reliability to the exclusion of local reliability, and Goldman (1986: 47) requires both. Where do Williamson, Pritchard, and Sosa fall on this spectrum? With respect to (SF**), it is evident from the manner in which Sosa formulates his safety condition that he thinks that only local reliability is necessary for knowledge in so far as (SF**) concerns truly believing a specific proposition P; that is, no mention is made of not falsely believing a different proposition Q. Notice, however, that as far as safety goes, Sosa requires that the agent exhibit perfect local reliability; that is, there can be no close world in which S falsely believes P.

Unlike Sosa, Pritchard, in order to handle knowledge of necessarily true propositions, requires global reliability, but a nuanced version thereof. Recall that Pritchard permits some false beliefs in non-near close worlds but has a zero tolerance for false beliefs in the nearer close worlds. Therefore, Pritchard can be classified as requiring perfect global reliability in the near close worlds and regular global reliability in the non-near close worlds. Additionally, both Pritchard and Sosa permit falsely believing P in a close world via a different method than the one used in the actual world.

With regards to Williamson, it is much harder to pin down the type of reliability at work in (SF). As mentioned, Williamson formulates the safety condition in different ways in different places. Some of these formulations clearly advocate for local reliability only, while others incorporate global reliability. And, further still, others push for subtler versions of both. Starting with local reliability, consider this formulation:

(SF1) “[I]n a case α one is safe from error in believing that [a condition] C obtains if and only if there is no case close to α in which one falsely believes that C obtains” (2000: 126-7).

A condition, for Williamson (ibid.: 52), is specified by a “that” clause relative to an agent and a time. Thus, “S believes that the tree is i inches tall” counts as S believing that a certain condition obtains. According to Williamson (ibid.: 114ff), a typical agent who looks at a tree and believes “that the tree is i inches tall” does not know “that the tree is i inches tall” because there is a close world in which the agent uses that same method and comes to falsely believe “that the tree is i inches tall” when in fact it is i+1 inches tall. Most people are unreliable about the height of trees to the nearest inch because our eyesight is not that powerful; we cannot tell the height of a tree to the nearest inch just by looking at it. This case demonstrates that Williamson requires local reliability since this is a case in which the agent lacks knowledge because there is a close world in which he falsely believes the same proposition using the same method as that used in the actual world. Given that for Williamson safe belief entails a zero tolerance for false belief in a close world, Williamson requires perfect local reliability.

Here is another formulation of the safety condition by Williamson (2000: 124):

(SF2) “One avoids false belief reliably in α if and only if one avoids false belief in every case similar enough to α.”

This formulation seems to rule out knowledge in the following case. Pat is pulling cards out of a hat on which sentences are written. Pat pulls the first out and upon reading it truly believes that oranges are fruits. Pat then pulls a second card out and upon reading the sentence written on it falsely believes that America is a province of Australia. Pat’s true belief that oranges are fruits is unsafe because Pat does not avoid false belief in a similar case; that is, Pat could easily have falsely believed a different proposition using the same method in a close world. Because Pat uses a globally unreliable method she lacks knowledge. Given that for Williamson, safe belief entails a zero tolerance for false belief in a close world, Williamson therefore also requires perfect global reliability.

Yet further formulations of safety by Williamson advocate for subtler versions of local and global reliability. Recall that as Pritchard and Sosa present the safety condition, knowing P is compatible with falsely believing P via a different method in a close world. Williamson agrees, but with a caveat:

(SF3) “P is required to be true only in similar cases in which it is believed on a similar basis” (2009: 364-5).

So for S to safely believe P via M not only must S not falsely believe P in any close world via M, S must also not falsely believe P using a relevantly similar method to M. Williamson extends this principle in a way that results in a non-standard version of global reliability:

(SF4) If in a case α one knows P on a basis B, then in any case close to α in which one believes a proposition P* close to P on a basis [B*] close to B, then P* is true (2009: 325).

In other words, to safely believe P via M in α it must also be the case that one does not falsely believe P* via M* in a close case. For ease of reference, here is a gloss in the vicinity of Williamson’s conception of a safe belief:

(SF!) S safely believes P via a method M in world W if and only if there is no close world to W in which:

(i) S falsely believes P via M or a relevantly similar method M*; or

(ii) S falsely believes any proposition via M; or

(iii) S falsely believes a relevantly similar proposition P* using a relevantly similar method M*.

Williamson is thus committed to S knowing P in W at T only if S (SF!)-safely believes P. Since Williamson’s picture of “could easily have falsely believed” is richer than Pritchard’s or Sosa’s, more is needed to be safe from error for Williamson than for the latter two.

There are reasons independent of any of these three authors that suggest that knowledge should require both global and a local reliability. Firstly, the problem of vagueness supports a global reliability formulation of safety as follows. Some vague concepts may have different meanings in different worlds. It follows, then, that sentences with the same words can express different propositions in different worlds even when these worlds are very close (Williamson 1994: 230-4). For example, the property expressed by bald in the actual world might be having less than twenty hairs on one’s head while the property expressed by bald in a close world W might be having less than eighteen hairs on one’s head. If this is the case, then the sentence Pollock is bald expresses different propositions in these two worlds. Hence if Jackson, in the actual world, believes of Pollock that he is bald (Pollock having nineteen hairs on his head) then his belief will turn out to be unsafe as there is a close world, namely W, in which Jackson falsely believes of Pollock that he is bald. In cases such as these, for an agent to know P via M it must be the case that the agent could not easily have falsely believed P* via M (where P* counts as a different proposition in that close world).

Knowledge of propositions with singular content requires safety to be formulated in a globally reliable way. Consider the case in which Jones, looking at a real barn surrounded by fake barns, forms the true belief that “that is a barn.” The intuition is to deny Jones knowledge despite the fact that there is no close world in which that very barn is not a barn (assuming that a barn is essentially a barn). Since Jones could easily have falsely believed of a fake barn that “that is a barn,” which expresses a different and false proposition, Jones is denied knowledge.

iii. Methods

Methods can be individuated in a variety of ways: internally or externally, and in a coarse-grained or fine-grained way.

A way of individuating methods is internal if it respects the constraint that agents who form a belief P and who are internal duplicates share the same method; and external if it does not respect that constraint. Alternatively, if method individuation supervenes solely on brain states, then methods are internally individuated; if two agents can be in the same brain state yet be using different methods, then methods are individuated externally.

A way of individuating methods is coarse-grained if methods are described broadly or generally for example, the visual method. On the other hand, a way of individuating methods is fine-grained if methods are described in detail for example, the visual method for large objects at close range under favorable lighting conditions. As the degree of detail to which a method can be described is a parameter along a continuous spectrum, fine-grained and coarse-grained individuation permit of a wide range of generality or detail. Specifying the relevant detail for each method is known as the generality problem for reliabilism. Given that reliably believing is part of safety, safety faces the generality problem, something Williamson acknowledges (2009: 308).

Nozick (1981: 233) argues for an accessibility constraint on method individuation; that is, regardless of how methods are individuated, a difference in methods must always be accessible to the agent. It is evident, then, that an accessibility constraint is in tension with both external and fine-grained individuation since, ex hypothesi, neither the difference between seeing and hallucinating nor the difference between two finely-grained methods would be detectable by the typical agent.

Williamson and Pritchard deny such an accessibility constraint, thereby opening the way for external, fine-grained individuation of methods. For Williamson the accessibility constraint assumes that methods are a luminous condition, where a luminous condition is defined as a condition such that whenever it obtains the agent is in a position to know that it obtains (Williamson 2000: 95). But, as Williamson (ibid.: 96-8) argues, no non-trivial condition is luminous. Therefore the accessibility condition should be disregarded.

Pritchard (2005: 153) argues that safety will get the wrong result in some cases unless the accessibility condition is dropped because agents are fallible when it comes to determining which methods they use. For example, S might incorrectly think that she believes P via method M when in fact she believes it via M*. In some cases M delivers safe belief while M* doesn’t. Were the relevant method for a determination of safety the method the agent considers to be the one by which she believes, safety would get the wrong result in such cases.

One further argument against the accessibility condition is that it generates an infinite regress: S must be aware of which method she uses to believe P, the method she used to determine that, the method she used to determine that, and so on. Although these three arguments do not entail that internal and coarse-grained individuation are unsustainable, they do show that one reason in favor of such positions is unpromising.

We typically talk about methods or bases of belief in a coarse-grained way. Williamson, however, adopts a fine-grained, external individuation of bases. For example, Williamson (2009b: 307, 325 n.13) thinks that, other things being equal, seeing a daschund and seeing a wolf count as different bases; believing that one is drinking pure, unadulterated water on the basis of drinking pure, unadulterated water from a glass is not the same basis as believing as much when drinking water from a glass that has been doctored with undetectable toxins by conniving agents; believing that one was shown x number of flashes after drinking regular orange juice does not count as the same basis as believing that one was shown x number of flashes after drinking a glass of orange juice with a tasteless mind-altering drug; and, finally, believing that S₁ is married by looking at S₁’s wedding ring and believing that S₂ is married by looking at S₂’s wedding ring count as different methods if S₁reliably wears her ring and S₂ does not.

Williamson is inclined towards external, (super) fine-grained individuation of methods owing to his position vis-à-vis luminosity and skepticism. Regarding the former, in some cases the circumstances of a case can change in very gradual ways that the agent fails to detect such that at the start of the case the basis of belief is reliable while unreliable at the end of the case. Consider, for example, a case in which I see a pencil on a desk in front of me under favorable conditions. Assumedly I know that there is a pencil on the desk. I then begin to gradually walk backwards from the desk all the while keeping my eyes on the pencil until I reach a point at which it appears as a mere blur in the distance. At that point beliefs I form based on vision are no more than guesses. At each point in my growing distance from the desk my visual abilities start deteriorating slowly such that at some indiscernible point my eyesight no longer counts as reliable with respect to the pencil. Were bases of belief individuated in an internal, coarse-grained manner such that my looking at the pencil close-up and my looking at the pencil at a distance count as the same method, then I would fail to know that there is a pencil on the desk when close to the table since there is a close world in which I look at it from a distance and form a false belief that there is pen on the desk, which is intuitively the incorrect result. Consequently, minimal changes in the external environment result in a difference in the basis of belief formation.

iv. Skepticism

One of the selling points of safety is that it, unlike the relevant alternatives and sensitivity conditions, permits one to know the denial of skeptical hypotheses, thereby maintaining closure. Here is the skeptical argument from closure:

(1) I know I have hands.

(2) If I know I have hands then I know I am not a brain in the vat.

(3) I don’t know that I am not a brain in the vat.

This triad is inconsistent because, claims the skeptic, one cannot know the denials of skeptical hypotheses; that is, one cannot know that one is not in the bad case (the denial of (3)). In other words, if I know I have hands, then by closure I should know I am not a handless brain in the vat. But, claims the skeptic, one is never in a position to know that one is not a handless brain in the vat. It follows, then, that I do not know that I have hands.

Pritchard (2005: 159) claims that if one is in the good case then one sees that one has hands based on perception. In the bad case one does not see that one has hands; rather, one is fed images of hands. As a result of this difference in method, the bad case automatically counts as irrelevant since only those cases in which one forms beliefs based on veridical perception count as relevant: “only those nearby possible worlds in which the agent formed her belief in the same way as in the actual world are at issue” (ibid. 161). Since, by definition of the cases, the brain in the vat is not using the same method as the agent in the good case, one can consequently know the denial of the skeptical hypothesis entailed by one’s knowledge of everyday propositions since there is no close world to the good case in which one falsely believes the denial of the skeptical hypothesis.

Williamson resists skepticism by exposing and undermining those claims that tempt us towards (3); namely the idea that a brain in the vat and the agent in the good case have exactly the same evidence. According to Williamson (2000: 9) “one’s total evidence is simply one’s total knowledge.” Since the agent in the good case has good evidence and the brain the vat has bad evidence, this constitutes a sufficient dissimilarity between the cases. Therefore, the false belief in the bad case counts as irrelevant to true belief in the good case. Alternatively, Williamson can be read as saying that individuating methods externally and in a fine-grained manner leads to the conclusion that believing truly on the basis of good evidence is sufficiently dissimilar to believing falsely on the basis of bad evidence (ibid.: 169). The epistemic impoverishment of the brain in the vat is thus irrelevant. Williamson (2009d: 21) has made the following further claim:

The idea is that when one knows p “on basis b,” worlds in which one does not believe p “on basis b” do not count as close; but knowing “on basis b” requires p to be true in all close worlds in which one believes p “on basis b;” thus p is true in all close worlds. In this sense, the danger from which one is safe is p’s being false, not only one’s believing p when it is false.

Thus the bad case counts as far off because in the bad case P is false. This difference between the good and bad cases constitutes a sufficient dissimilarity to permit one to know in the good case.

Since Sosa is not as explicit about how he builds methods into his safety condition, all three strategies are compatible with what he says. For example, he sometimes talks as if the bad case is far off (1999a: 147; 2000: 15), while at other times (1999b: 379) he can be read as thinking that even if it were close it would be irrelevant because the agent is using a different method in that case.

There are thus three different strategies a safety theorist can employ to oppose skepticism:

(i) Since the agent in the bad case uses a different method from the agent in the good case, the bad case is sufficiently dissimilar from the good case and thus does not count as close;

(ii) The bad case counts as close to the good case yet is irrelevant given that the agent in the bad case uses a different method from the agent in the good case;

(iii) While the agents in the good and bad cases use the same method, the bad case counts as far off given the overall dissimilarities between it and the good case;

The safety condition is therefore a powerful tool against skepticism. For skepticism to be an appealing theory the skeptic would have to provide some reason for thinking that in every case α involving an agent S, method M, time T, and proposition P, there is a close and relevant case β in which a skeptical hypothesis is true such that S could easily have failed to be locally or globally reliable in α with respect to P at T (where the definitions of local and global reliability differ depending on which safety theorist is in question).

b. How do the Safety and Sensitivity Conditions Differ?

Given that the sensitivity condition for knowledge enjoyed such prominence, it is important to determine how the safety condition differs from it. Such a comparison will shed light on some virtues of the safety condition relative to the sensitivity condition.

In some cases sensitivity is the more stringent condition, while in others safety is. The following two points of logic elicit the difference between the safety and sensitivity conditions. When it comes to cases concerning knowledge of the denial of skeptical hypotheses, the safety principle is less demanding than the sensitivity principle. The latter principle requires that the agent not believe P in the nearest possible world in which P is false. As such no agent can know the denial of skeptical hypotheses by the simple sensitivity test, for example, I am not a brain in the vat, because in the nearest possible world in which the agent is a brain in the vat the agent continues to believe (falsely) that he is not a brain in the vat. So while agents typically satisfy the sensitivity condition with respect to everyday propositions and thus count as knowing many everyday propositions, they cannot satisfy the sensitivity condition with respect to the denial of skeptical hypothesis. Hence the incompatibility of the sensitivity condition and single-premise closure, for knowledge of everyday propositions entails knowledge of the denial of skeptical hypotheses incompatible with those propositions.

The safety principle, however, is compatible with single-premise closure for it permits knowing the denial of skeptical hypotheses. By the safety principle I count as knowing the everyday proposition P “that I have hands” by method M only if I safely believe P. It follows, then, that if I safely believe P then there is no close world in which I am a brain in the vat and am led to falsely believe that I have hands by M (as explained in the previous section). Consequently, if I know that I have hands and I know that that entails that I am not a brain in the vat, then I know that I am not a brain in the vat.

On the other hand, cases can be constructed in which safety is more demanding than sensitivity. Consider the following case: S truly believes P via M in the actual world but (i) in the closest world in which P is false S does not believe P, and (ii) there is a close world in which S falsely believes P via M. In this case S satisfies the sensitivity condition but fails to satisfy the safety condition. A case by Goldman (1986: 45) can be used to illustrate this point. Mary has an unreliable thermometer in her medicine cabinet which she uses to measure her temperature. It just so happens to correctly read her temperature of 38°C in this case. However, in the nearest world in which her temperature is not 38°C and she uses this thermometer to take her temperature, she is distracted by her son and she doesn’t form any belief about her temperature. She accordingly satisfies the sensitivity condition for knowledge since she does not believe P in the nearest world in which P is false. However, there is some other close world in which she uses this thermometer to take her temperature and forms a false belief thereby. Mary thus fails to satisfy the safety condition. It follows, then, that the following pair of conditionals are false:

If S safely believes P then S sensitively believes P.

If S sensitively believes P then S safely believes P.

The logic of these conditionals makes explicit the respects in which safety is similar to and different from the sensitivity condition.

c. The Semantics of Safety

In a non-epistemic context it is easy to see that “safe” can function as a gradable adjective. For instance, if S has three paths to choose from to get to her destination, it is perfectly acceptable to say that although path X is safe, Y is safer, and that path Z the safest of the three paths. “Similarity” also comes in degrees: London is more similar to Manchester than to Kabul. Possible worlds can thus be closer to or further from the actual world on a sliding scale of similarity. S’s belief P, therefore, can be safer than S’s belief Q. Although “safe” is a gradable adjective, the safety condition is not presented within the framework of a contextualist semantics for “knowledge,” where, roughly speaking, contextualism about ”knowledge” is the claim that the truth conditions of the proposition “S knows P” depend on the context of the attributer. In other words, “knowledge” picks out different relations in the different contexts of attribution where said contexts are a function of the varying interests of the attributer, not the possessor, of knowledge. Contextualism has gained its popularity through, among other things, its proposed solution to the skeptical challenge from closure. Sosa, Williamson, and Pritchard are all standard invariantists about the semantics of knowledge, invariantism being the denial of contextualism. (See Williamson (2009d: 18) for two different ways in which the gradability of safety can be accommodated without adopting a contextualist semantics for “know.”) If one’s main concern is skepticism, then the safety theorist has no need for a contextualist semantics for “knowledge” given the three strategies available to them for opposing skepticism (listed above). Nonetheless, it is easy enough to see how one could model the safety condition along contextualist lines if one had independent reasons for adopting a contextualist semantics for “knowledge”—those factors that weigh in on the similarity measure of close worlds will be those salient to the attributer, not the agent.

4. Safety in Action

To get a better feel for how the safety condition works, it proves beneficial to undertake an exercise in seeing how safety handles some of the troubling cases in the literature. Obviously each case can be modified in such a way as to make things harder or easier for the safety theorist. For present purposes such cases will be ignored.

a. Gettier and Chisholm

Jones is told by his boss that Smith will get the promotion. Jones then sees Smith putting ten coins in his pocket. Jones accordingly infers that the man who will get the promotion has ten coins in his pocket. However, Jones (not Smith) gets the job and Jones just so happens to have ten coins in his pocket. According to Gettier (1963) Jones’s belief does not amount to knowledge. How does the safety condition handle this case? Jones’s belief is unsafe because there are close worlds in which (a) in which Carter gets the job but has no coins in his pocket, or (b) in which Jones get the job but has nine coins in his pocket.

The same reasoning applies to Chisholm’s (1977) case in which Jones believes that there is a sheep in the field upon seeing a fluffy white animal in the distance. However, while what Jones sees is a white dog there is indeed a sheep in the field lying behind a rock hidden from Jones’s sight. According to Chisholm, Jones doesn’t count as knowing that there is a sheep in the field. The safety condition captures this intuition. Jones’s belief is unsafe because there is a close world in which there is no sheep behind the rock and Jones falsely believes that there is a sheep in the field; that is, the method of inferring the presence of sheep by seeing dogs is unreliable.

b. Fake Barns

Jones is in an area with many fake barns. Jones sees a real barn in the field and forms the belief that there is a barn in the field. Does Jones know that there is a barn in the field? Prima facie, Jones’s belief counts as unsafe as there is a close world in which he looks at a fake barn and falsely believes that it is a (real) barn.

However, this case turns out to be a little harder to explain because the details of the case can be manipulated into yielding bizarre intuitions in similarly structured cases (Hawthorne and Gendler 2005). What if, for example, Jones would not have come across such a fake barn because he wasn’t in walking distance of it? The permutations of the standard setup of this case abound (see for example, Peacocke (1999: 324), Neta and Rohrbaugh (2004: 399), Comesaña (2005: 396), and Lackey (2006)). Similar permutations can be made for the Gettier and Chisholm cases, for example, where circumstances are such that the person who gets the job in all close worlds has ten coins in his or her pocket or that in all close worlds there is a sheep behind the rock.

This is one of those cases that manifests the vagueness present in the safety condition. As Williamson (2000: 100; 2009b: 305) indicates, there will be cases in which whether or not one thinks that there is a close world in which the agent falsely believes depends on whether or not one is inclined to attribute knowledge to that agent in that case; the vagueness in “relevantly similar,” “reliable,” and “knowledge” knowledge determinations in some cases notoriously difficult. Accordingly, the direction of one’s intuitions about whether or not Jones knows in each permutation of these cases will influence whether or not one thinks Jones has a false belief in a close world, and vice versa.

There is one significant permutation of this case that requires attention. Suppose the details of the case remain identical except that instead of forming the belief P that there is a barn in the field, Jones forms the belief Q that that is a barn (Hawthorne 2004: 56). Recall that Q is a singular proposition but P is not, where, roughly, a singular proposition is one that is constitutively about some particular. Sosa would have to find other reasons to deny Jones knowledge in this case, if he thinks he lacks it, given that his safety condition requires local reliability and true singular propositions are true in all close worlds. According to Williamson and Pritchard, Jones lacks knowledge in this case because there is a close world in which Jones looks at a fake barn and his belief that that is a barn expresses a different and false proposition.

c. Matches

Jones is about to light a match and forms the belief that the match will light once struck since all dry matches of this brand that he has struck have lit after being struck. However, the match doesn’t light because it was struck but rather does so because of some rare burst of radiation (adapted from Skyrms 1967: 383). Stipulate further that in all close worlds the match lights by friction. Is Jones’s belief safe?

The safety theorist seems drawn into denying knowledge in this case because there is a sense in which Jones is still lucky, in an epistemically malignant way, that his belief is true. When described in this way, this case is a stronger version of many of the Gettier cases mentioned so far because Jones’s belief is true by luck in the actual world but not so in any close world. Such cases would demonstrate that safety is not necessary for knowledge.

One way around this difficulty would be via Williamson’s claim that worlds which differ as far as trends go count as far off (see below B(i)). Hence, only worlds in which the match lights by a freak burst of radiation count as close. If worlds are ordered in this way, the example is presented in a flawed way that incorrectly indicates a problem for safety. Since the match lights in all those close worlds via radiation, Jones knows that his match will light.

5. Problems for Safety

As epistemologists ponder the details of the safety condition, it is to be expected that some will identify what they perceive to be its weaknesses or its failures. This section is devoted to three problem areas for safety.

a. Knowledge of Necessarily True Propositions

A necessarily true proposition is one which is true in all possible worlds. One might think, therefore, that knowledge of such propositions presents a problem for safety since there can be no close world in which S falsely believes such propositions. It should be clear at this point that this is a problem primarily for Sosa since his condition requires local reliability only; that is, not falsely believing P in close worlds. In other words, the counterfactual B(P) ☐→ P will be trivially true for any proposition P which is necessarily true. So knowledge of necessarily true propositions is going to be a problem for any account of knowledge that requires local reliability only.

Williamson and Pritchard have no such problems with knowledge of necessary truths since both require global reliability. There are cases that demonstrate that the method used to believe a necessarily true proposition can be globally unreliable. For example, suppose I use a coin to decide whether to believe 42 x 17 = 714 or to believe 32 ÷ 0.67 = 40, where I have no idea which is true without the use of a calculator. If the coin lands in such a way indicating that I should believe the first, which is necessarily true, then I am lucky to believe the necessary truth and not the necessary falsehood. I consequently do not know that 42 x 17 = 714 as I could just have easily have falsely believed the different proposition expressed by 32 ÷ 0.67 = 40.

b. Knowledge of the Future

The following lottery puzzle is particularly troublesome for safety. On the assumption that a proposition about a future state of affairs is either true or false, we take ourselves to know many things about the future, for example, that the Lakers game is next Tuesday, or that the elections will be held next month. This being the case, intuitively at least, Suzy knows that she won’t be able to afford to buy a new house this year. On the other hand, we deny that Suzy knows that her lottery ticket will lose (even if the draw has already taken place and Suzy has not yet learnt of the draw result). This state of affairs, however, presents the following puzzle: assuming single-premise closure true, if Suzy knows that she won’t be able to afford to buy a new house this year, and knows that this entails that her ticket is a loser, then Suzy should be in a position to know that her ticket will lose (by deduction). But it is commonly held that agents do not know that their lottery tickets will lose. (The aptness of this intuition is often demonstrated by the impropriety of flatly asserting that one knows that one’s ticket will lose, or selling one’s ticket for a penny before learning of the draw results.) The intuitive pull of single-premise closure is in tension with intuitions about what can be known about the future and about lottery tickets.

Problems involving lotteries generalize (Hawthorne 2004: 3). For instance, we are willing to say that Peter knows that (P) he will be living in Sydney this coming year. Yet we are hesitant to say that Peter knows that (Q) he won’t be one of those unfortunate few to be involved in a fatal car accident in the coming months. Assuming single premise closure true, if we are willing to attribute to Peter knowledge of P, and Peter knows that P entails Q, we should then be willing to attribute Peter knowledge of Q.

One way of explaining why agents do not know that their lottery tickets will lose or that they won’t die in unexpected accidents is that both events have a non-zero objective probability of occurring. That is, events with a non-zero probability of occurring can occur in close worlds. Naturally, then, one might think that the world in which one’s lottery ticket wins or in which one dies from an unexpected motor accident is close and that therefore one’s beliefs that one will lose the lottery or not die in an accident are unsafe.

This line of thinking is devastating for safety, however, as it would effectively rule out knowledge of any propositions the content of which regards the future since, assuming indeterminism true, there is a non-zero probability that any proposition about the future will be false; that is, for any true proposition P about the future there will be a close world in which P is false and one believes P. If safety leads directly to skepticism about knowledge of the future this would be a good reason to give up safety.

One line of thought for a safety theorist to pursue in response to this problem is to support the following high-chance-close-world principle (HCCW): if there is a high objective chance at T₁ that the proposition P believed by S at T₁ will be false at T₂ given the state of the world at T₁ and the laws of nature, then S does not know P at T₁ as P is unsafe (even if P is true). The thinking behind this response is that if there is a high chance of some event occurring then that event could easily have occurred, which indicates that there is a natural connection between high chance and danger. For instance, if there is a high objective chance that the tornado will move in the direction of Kentucky, then it seems natural to say that Kentucky’s inhabitants are in danger.

Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio (2009) demonstrate that HCCW presents some rather unwelcomed problems for the safety theorist. Firstly, HCCW is in tension with knowledge by multi-premise closure. Suppose, by way of example, that at T₁ a subject S knows a range of chancy propositions P, Q, R, … about the future; that is, there is no close world in which any of those propositions are false. That said, while there may be a low probability for each proposition in that set that it will be false, for a sufficiently high number of propositions the probability at T₁that the conjunction of {P, Q, R, …} will be true at T₂ will be very low . Accordingly, the probability of the negation of {P, Q, R, …} is very high at T₁. By the lights of HCCW there will then be a close world in which that conjunction is false. Therefore, while an agent may know each conjunct in a set of chancy propositions about the future, the safety theorist who is committed to HCCW must deny that the agent knows the conjunction of those propositions. HCCW is therefore incompatible with multi-premise closure.

HCCW also creates problems for single-premise closure. Consider Plumpton who is about to begin a significantly long series of deductions from a true premise P₁ towards a true conclusion P_N. Suppose that at every step there is a significantly low objective probability that Plumpton’s deductive faculty will misfire leading him towards a false belief. If the chain is sufficiently long then there will be a high enough probability that the belief at the end of Plumpton’s deductive chain will be false, in which case, by HCCW, such a possibility counts as close. If closeness of worlds is cashed out in terms of HCCW, then Plumpton does not know P_Nif he deduced it from P_N-1, which is effectively the denial of single-premise closure for whenever the chance that the next step will be false is high enough (for example, the step leading from P_N-1to P_Nin Plumpton’s case) the deduction from that previous step will be ruled out as unsafe. The same problem arises for knowing a proposition at the end of a very long testimony or memory chain when there is a non-zero objective probability that the process will go astray at any given link of the chain.

Moreover, HCCW also struggles to explain the inconsistency of why, in some cases, we do attribute knowledge to agents concerning events with substantially low probabilities of occurring while in some case we do not. For instance, we are happy to say, following Greco (2007) and Vogel (1999), that a veteran cop knows that his rookie partner will fail to disarm the mugger by shooting a bullet down the barrel of the mugger’s gun, or that not all sixty golfers will score a hole-in-one on the par three hole, or that this monkey will not type out a copy of War and Peace if placed in front of a computer. Yet it is common to deny knowledge in the lottery case where the chances are substantially lower.

The safety theorist, therefore, owes us some story about how close worlds calibrate in cases involving objective chance.

i. Williamson’s Response

Williamson denies that there is a straightforward correlation between safety and objective probability. When it comes to knowledge there are two conceptions of safety that one can have—a no risk conception or a small risk conception. Williamson (2009d) rejects the latter owing to the way we use the concepts of safety and danger in ordinary, non-epistemic contexts. By way of argument, Williamson (ibid.: 11) asks us to consider the following two valid arguments that involve the use of our ordinary, non-epistemic concept “safe,” where the context is held fixed between premises and conclusion:

Argument A_safety	S was shot
	───────────────────────
	S was not safe from being shot

Argument B_safety	S was safe from being shot by X
	S was safe from being shot by Y
	S was safe from being shot by Z
	S was safe from being shot other than by X, Y, or Z
	───────────────────────────
	S was safe from being shot

Williamson then asks us to consider which of the two competing conception of safety (the “small risk” or “no risk”) secures the validity of these arguments by plugging in these conceptions in the relevant premises and conclusions:

Argument A_{small risk}

S was shot

─────────────────────────

S’s risk of being shot was not small

Argument B_{small risk}	S’s risk of being shot by X was small
	S’s risk of being shot by Y was small
	S’s risk of being shot by Z was small
	S’s risk of being shot other than by X, Y, or Z was small
	───────────────────────────────────────
	S’s risk of being shot was small

Argument A_{no risk}	S was shot
	───────────────────────────
	S was at some risk of being shot

Argument B_{no risk}	S was at no risk of being shot by X
	S was at no risk of being shot by Y
	S was at no risk of being shot by Z
	S was at no risk of being shot by other than X, Y, or Z
	──────────────────────────────────────
	S was at no risk of being shot

With regards to the “small risk” conception of safety, the argument A _{small risk} is invalid since even events with a small risk of occurring in a world W do occur in W, for example, lottery wins. Argument B _{small risk} is invalid because small risks add up to large ones. On the other hand, the “no risk” conception of safety fairs much better for these reasons. Since S was shot in some world close to W, and W being the closest world to itself, S was at some risk of being shot, which demonstrates the validity of Argument A _{no risk}. This explains why S is not safe from being shot in W at a time T. Similarly, Argument B _{no risk} is valid since if S was not shot by X in any close world to W at T, and so on with respect to Y, or Z or anyone else, then there is no close world in which S was shot. This exercise with the ordinary conception of safety demonstrates that the ordinary conception thereof is not in terms of small risk or probability. (Peacocke (1999: 310-11) likewise understands the concept of safety in this way: “The relevant kind of possibility is one under which something’s not being possible means that in a certain way one can rely on its not obtaining” (original emphasis).) Therefore, argues Williamson, the notion of a safe belief is not one correlated with probability.

In light of this divergence between safety and probability, one counts as safely believing a conjunction, by Williamson’s lights, if and only if one safely believes the conjunction on a basis that includes safely believing each conjunct. Similarly, if one safely believes P and safely believes P → Q, then one safely believes Q if and only if the basis on which one believes Q includes the basis on which one believes P and P → Q, for in that case there will be no close world in which one believes Q and Q is false. It stands to reason then, that there will be cases in which S safely believes P and safely believes P → Q, yet does not safely believe Q since the basis on which S believes the latter does not include the basis of the former two beliefs. One must safely derive that which is entailed by what one already safely believes before one counts as safely believing the entailment: “We might say that safe derivation means that one makes a ‘knowledgeable’ connection from premises to conclusion, rather than that one knows the connection” (Williamson 2009d: 27).

Given these arguments, Williamson (ibid.: 19), demonstrates that in some cases knowing and objective probability dramatically diverge. For example, suppose I designate the winning lottery ticket “Lucky” and then believe that Lucky will win the lottery (where “Lucky” is a rigid designator). Nonetheless, I count as knowing in advance that Lucky will win despite each ticket having the very same low probability of winning.

For these reasons the cases involving knowledge of risky propositions do not bother a no risk conception of safety so long as one safely believes the conjunction on a basis that includes the bases on which one safely believes each conjunct. The same applies to very lengthy derivations. It stands to reason, then, that Plumpton knows P_N despite there being a very high objective probability that P_N is false. And so long as there is no close world in which one falsely believes a proposition P about the future, then one safely believes P despite there being a non-zero-probability that P is false, for example, that no monkey will type out War and Peace, that not all sixty golfers will score a hole-in-one, or that the rookie will not disarm the mugger. With respect to knowledge of the future, Williamson (2009c: 327) writes that “the occurrence of an event in β that bucks a relevant trend in α may be a relevant lack of closeness between α and β, even though the trend falls well short of a being a strict law.” Trends are further indicators of closeness between cases. So in a case α an agent S can be in a position to know a proposition P about the future even though there is a non-zero probability that P will be false since the case β in which it is false is sufficiently distant from α owing to P’s being false in β bucking a trend in α.

Matters involving lottery puzzles remain troublesome for Williamson, however. In the cases where the known proposition entails a risky proposition about the future for example, that one will be healthy for the rest of the year, Williamson is happy to admit that one does safely believe that risky proposition given the divergence between safety and small risk (as explained above). However, this seems to indicate that Williamson is happy to permit that one can safely infer that one’s lottery ticket will lose, which is problematic since it contradicts a widely-held intuition and goes against Williamson’s prior commitment in print that one does not know that one’s ticket will lose (2000: 117, 247). In conversation Williamson has made two salient remarks in response to these points. First, he still maintains that one does not know one’s ticket will lose when this belief is formed on the basis of reflecting on the low odds of it winning. He is open to one’s knowing that one’s ticket will lose by other bases of belief, for example, safe derivation from known propositions about the future. So in some lottery puzzles Williamson will concede that one can know that one’s ticket will lose. Second, Williamson has emphasized that lottery puzzles are unstable since one readily attributes knowledge about the future only to retract it when the lottery entailment becomes salient. Since Williamson’s concerns are the structural features of knowledge, he is not overly perturbed by problems generated by specific cases which rest on very unstable intuitions.

ii. Pritchard’s Response

Pritchard (2008: 41; 2009: 29), like Williamson, argues that the relationship between objective probability and safety is not one of direct correlation but motivates his claim using intuitions from a different lottery case. We say that S does not know by reflecting on the extremely long odds of winning a lottery that her ticket will lose (even if the draw has already occurred and S is unaware of the results) but that S does know that it lost from reading the result in the newspaper. This is a somewhat surprising result given that the objective probability of being wrong in the former case is lower than in the latter case since newspapers do sometimes print errors. Were closeness determined according to the HCCW principle, the the intuitions should be the converse. Safety, argues Pritchard, captures the intuitions in this case since the world in which one wins a lottery is very much like the actual world since all that differentiates the two worlds in this context is a bunch of balls falling differently. That is why one cannot know that one’s ticket will lose. However, given the copious editing processes at newspapers, quite a bit would have to go wrong for there to be a printing error.

Using this understanding of closeness Pritchard believes he can answer the lottery puzzles Hawthorne raises. Pritchard contends that we are mistaken in thinking that these are puzzles because our intuitions are being misled by a lack of detail in the presentation of the cases (ibid. 43-8). If S has a lottery ticket in his pocket for a draw taking place tomorrow, Pritchard claims that we ought to resist attributing knowledge to S that he won’t have enough money to go on a safari this year since the world in which he wins a major prize in the forthcoming lottery is close. In such a case, argues Pritchard, the agent also does not know that his ticket will lose. Conversely, if S does not have a lottery ticket in hand, then S knows he won’t go on safari and knows that he won’t win the lottery. Either way closure is preserved.

In a similar fashion Pritchard argues away some of the other lottery-like puzzles. If we are told that S is a healthy person then we are prone to affirm that S knows that S will be living in Wyoming this coming year and that S knows that S won’t have a heart attack since the world in which S, a healthy person drops dead from a totally unexpected heart attack, is far off. Likewise, if we are told that S has very high cholesterol, then we will deny that S knows that S will be living in Wyoming this year and that S won’t have a heart attack. Closure is maintained in both cases.

Some might have reservations about the adequacy of Pritchard’s response, however. It is a matter of differing intuitions whether or not there is a relevant difference between the actual world and worlds in which perfectly healthy people die from a sudden and unexpected heart attack or are involved in a fatal car accident. If such worlds are relevantly similar to the actual world, then such worlds should accordingly count as close on Pritchard’s line of thought. Therefore, contrary to Pritchard, such agents should be denied knowledge of their future whereabouts. The same line of reasoning can be applied to the lottery and newspaper case; the world in which the type setting machine prints an error owing to a technical glitch is much closer to the actual world than the world in which the seven balls corresponding to the numbers on one’s lottery ticket fall into the dedicated slots because much less has to change in the former case than in the latter case. If closeness of worlds is determined by how much the two worlds actually differ on the details of the case, then one ought to be unable to know stuff by reading the newspaper, which is an untenable result. Finally, it is also unclear how Pritchard’ strategy can handle the troublesome cases involving multi-premise closure that Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio describe. The world in which Plumpton makes a mistake in the very long deductive chain he is about to embark upon seems very similar to the actual world. A natural reading of “at each step the chance that he will make a mistake is exceedingly low but that he will make a mistake overall exceedingly high” is that the two worlds are very similar; not much change is required for Plumpton to make a mistake somewhere along the way.

Despite these concerns, the disparity between closeness and objective probability that Pritchard is urging does seem to handle the Vogel and Greco cases quite well. Events in the actual would have to change significantly for sixty golfers all to score holes-in-one, or for the rookie to disarm the mugger, or for the monkey to type War and Peace. The angles of the club face, timing, ball spin, wind speeds, strength of swing, and so forth. would all have to somehow fall together in such a way on sixty different occasions for all sixty golfers to succeed in scoring holes-in-one. Similar thoughts apply to the rookie and monkey cases.

c. Safety and Determinism

The safety theorist argues that if S knows P then S could not have easily been wrong. Suppose, for the sake of argument, that our world is a deterministic world in the sense that the state of the world at T_N is determined by the state of the world at T_N—1 plus the laws of nature.. In what sense, then, could S have easily gone wrong since, if determinism is true, S could not but have believed P truly? Williamson (2000: 124, 2009: 325) argues that “determinism does not trivialize safety.” Williamson demonstrates this point by way of an example of a ball balanced on the tip of a cone. Such a ball, even in a deterministic world, is not safe from falling because, argues Williamson, the initial conditions could easily have been different such that the ball falls. By the “initial conditions” he means “the time of the case, not to the beginning of the universe” (2000: 124).

The suggestion, then, seems to be that in a case α in a deterministic world W, S safely believes P if and only if had the initial conditions of the case been slightly different S would still have truly believed P. What remains unclear, however, is why Williamson says that only the initial conditions of the case need to be changed and not the initial conditions of the universe, for, after all, altering the initial conditions of the case in a deterministic world can only be achieved if one alters the initial conditions of the universe itself. So altering the initial conditions of the case necessitates altering the initial conditions of the universe. In addition, on some conceptions of determinism, small scale changes at the beginning of the universe generate large-scale changes further down the chain of events. Consequently, it is unclear whether altering the initial conditions of the universe will generate sufficiently similar cases in which S falsely believes P. Finally, it seems somewhat odd to say that even if the actual world is a deterministic world, then even though I am currently typing in Oxford I could just have easily been hunting bears in Mongolia since a slight alteration in the initial conditions of the universe would have resulted in my being a bear hunter.

One maneuver a safety theorist can make in response to the foregoing difficulties is to adopt a move Lewis makes in his work on the semantics of counterfactuals. Suppose a world W is a deterministic world and in a case α in W S truly believes P at T. The safety theorist could argue that S safely believes P at T in W if and only if had there been a small miracle at T or some time shortly before T such that different conditions prevailed in a case β very similar to α, S truly believes P. (Williamson has raised such an option in conversation.)

Some might be wary of such a metaphysics since they would assume that miracles are not the kind of things we want in our ontology or epistemology. So it appears that unless the safety theorist wishes to adopt a somewhat unorthodox metaphysics, safety, despite Williamson’s insistence to the contrary, is hostage to determinism. But in the safety theorist’s defense, our best physics seems to provide a better case for indeterminism than determinism. It remains the case, nevertheless, that the safety theorist needs be more forthcoming about the relationship between the physical conditions of the world and the modality of the safety condition.

6. References and Further Reading

Armstrong, D. 1973. Belief, Truth, and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- An important early contribution to the study of knowledge in the post-Gettier period, particularly the idea that knowledge requires reliability.
Chisholm, R. 1977. Theory of Knowledge. 2^nd ed. NJ: Prentice Hall.
- One of the notable works in the early period of contemporary analytic epistemology.
Comesaña, J. 2005. “Unsafe Knowledge.” Synthese 146: 395-404.
- This author argues that safe belief is not necessary for knowledge.
Dretske, F. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 49: 1-22.
- In this paper Dretske argues for a sensitivity condition for knowledge.
Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
- Here the famous counterexamples to the justified true belief account of knowledge are presented.
Goldman, A. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy, 64 (12): 357-372.
- Goldman presents a causal account of knowledge, which was an early attempt at solving the Gettier problem. Goldman later abounded this account in favor of his relevant alternatives account, a position he still maintains today.
Goldman, A. 1976. “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” The Journal of Philosophy, 73: 771-91.
- The relevant alternatives condition for knowledge is explicated and defended.
Goldman, A. 1986. Epistemology and Cognition. USA: Harvard University Press.
- A contemporary classic that presents Goldman’s epistemics—his multidisciplinary project of bringing the developments in cognitive psychology to bear on questions in individual and social epistemology.
Goldman, A. 2007. “Philosophical Intuitions: Their Target, Their Source, and Their Epistemic Status.” Grazer Philosophische Studien 74: 1-26.
- In this paper Goldman discusses the place of intuition in philosophy and the epistemic status of such intuitions, which is currently a hot topic in epistemology.
Greco, J. 2007. “Worries about Pritchard’s Safety.” Synthese 158: 299-302.
- Problems for Pritchard’s safety condition are raised.
Hawthorne, J. 2004. Knowledge and Lotteries. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- This is a masterful treatment of the lottery problem and includes a helpful comparative assessment of the various semantic solutions proposed to this problem.
Hawthorne, J. & Gendler, T. 2005. “The Real Guide to Fake Barns.” Philosophical Studies 124: 331-352.
- A humorous and pointed display of how some Gettier cases can be manipulated into yield even tougher cases for accounts of knowledge to handle.
Hawthorne, J. & Lasonen-Aarnio, M. 2009. “Knowledge and Objective Chance”. In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 92-108.
- In this piece the problematic relationship between safety and probability is identified.
Lackey, J. 2006. “Pritchard’s Epistemic Luck.” Philosophical Quarterly 56: 284-9.
- This author argues for inadequacies in Pritchard’s work on safety.
Lewis, D. 1973. Counterfactuals. Oxford: Blackwell.
- Here Lewis presents his modal semantics for counterfactuals.
McGinn, C. 1999. “The Concept of Knowledge.” In: McGinn, C. Knowledge and Reality: Selected Essays. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 7-35.
- In this collection of his essays, McGinn defends his favored account of knowledge.
Neta, R. & Rohrbaugh, G. “Luminosity and the Safety of Knowledge.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 85 (2004) 396–406.
- Arguments against safety are presented.
Nozick, R. 1981. Philosophical Explanations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Chapter 3 contains Nozick’s defense of his sensitivity condition for knowledge.
Peacocke, C. 1999. Being Known. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- In §7.5 Peacocke presents a useful elaboration of the notion of “could easily have.”
Pritchard, D. 2005. Epistemic Luck. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A masterful exposition of the place luck plays in epistemology.
Pritchard, D. 2007. “Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Synthese 158: 277-98.
- An argument for a refined safety condition for knowledge.
Pritchard, D. 2008. “Knowledge, Luck, and Lotteries.” In: Hendricks, V. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). New Waves in Epistemology. London: Palgrave Macmillan, pp. 28-51.
- Here Pritchard discusses the lottery problem for safety at length.
Pritchard, D. 2009a. “Safety-Based Epistemology: Whither Now?” Journal of Philosophical Research 34: 33-45.
- Further refinements of the safety condition.
Pritchard, D. 2009b. Knowledge. London: Palgrave Macmillan
- A general and accessible introduction to knowledge.
Russell, B. 1948. Human Knowledge: Its Scope and its Limits. London: Allen & Unwin.
- Here Russell lays out a general treatment of human knowledge part of which discusses his famous clock case.
Sainsbury, R.M. 1997. “Easy Possibilities.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 57(4): 907-919.
- A discussion of easy possibility with respect to S not easily falsely believing P.
Shope, R. 1983. An Analysis of Knowing: A Decade of Research. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- A helpful overview of the early post-Gettier literature.
Skyrms, F.B. 1967. “The Explication of ‘X knows that P’.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 373-89.
- An early work in epistemology in the post-Gettier period.
Sosa, E. 1999a. “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 141-54.
- A discussion of safety in the context of skepticism.
Sosa, E. 1999b. “How must knowledge be modally related to what is known?” Philosophical Topics 26 (1&2): 373-384.
- Sosa argues that a contraposition of Nozick’s sensitivity condition of knowledge is a superior condition for knowledge.
Sosa, E. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge Volume I. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Sosa, E. 2009. Reflective Knowledge: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge Volume II. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- In these two publications Sosa develops and refines his work on safety into a virtue account of knowledge that does not lean so heavily on a “brute” safety condition for knowledge. As a result, Sosa (and Pritchard) can no longer be strictly labeled as a safety theorist. Indeed, Sosa is open to there being cases of lucky knowledge.
Vogel, J. 1999. “The New Relative Alternative Theory”. Philosophical Perspectives 13: 155-80.
- Here one finds, among other things, some interesting cases involving luck.
Williamson, T. 1994. Vagueness. London: Routledge.
- Here Williamson presents a case for his epistemic conception of vagueness.
Williamson, T. 2000. Knowledge and its Limits. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A contemporary classic in epistemology in which Williamson argues for some rather iconoclastic positions about knowledge and evidence, among other important questions.
Williamson, T. 2009a. “Reply to Cassam.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 285-292.
- This is a collection of concerns several authors raise about various aspects of Williamson’s work in epistemology. The book concludes with Williamson’s replies.
Williamson, T. 2009b. “Reply to Goldman.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 305-312.
Williamson, T. 2009c. “Reply to John Hawthorne and Maria Lasonen-Aarnio.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 313-29.
Williamson, T. 2009d. “Probability and Danger.” The Amherst Lecture in Philosophy.
- A clarification of the relationship between safe belief and probability.

Author Information

Dani Rabinowitz
Email: dani.rabinowitz@philosophy.ox.ac.uk
Oxford University
United Kingdom

Surveillance Ethics

Surveillance involves paying close and sustained attention to another person. It is distinct from casual yet focused people-watching, such as might occur at a pavement cafe, to the extent that it is sustained over time. Furthermore the design is not to pay attention to just anyone, but to pay attention to some entity (a person or group) in particular and for a particular reason. Nor does surveillance have to involve watching. It may also involve listening, as when a telephone conversation is bugged, or even smelling, as in the case of dogs trained to discover drugs, or hardware which is able to discover explosives at a distance.

The ethics of surveillance considers the moral aspects of how surveillance is employed. Is it a value-neutral activity which may be used for good or ill, or is it always problematic and if so why? What are the benefits and harms of surveillance? Who is entitled to carry out surveillance, when and under what circumstances? Are there any circumstances under which someone should never be under surveillance?

This article provides a brief overview of the history of surveillance ethics, beginning with Jeremy Bentham and George Orwell. It then looks at the development of surveillance studies in the light of Michel Foucault and the challenges posed by new techniques of surveillance which allow unprecedented collection and retention of information. The bulk of this article focuses on considering the ethical challenges posed by surveillance. These include why surveillance is undertaken and by whom, as well as when and how it may be employed. This is followed by an examination of a number of concerns regarding the impact of surveillance such as social sorting, distance and chilling effects.

Origins
Recent History
Privacy
Trust and Autonomy
Cause
Authority
Necessity
Means
Social Sorting
Function Creep
Distance
Chilling Effects
Power
References and Further Reading

1. Origins

Jeremy Bentham’s idea of the Panopticon is arguably the first significant reference to surveillance ethics in the modern period (Bentham 1995). The Panopticon was to be a prison, comprising a circular building with the cells adjacent to the outside walls. In the centre was a tower in which the prison supervisor would live and monitor the inmates. Large external windows and smaller internal windows in each cell would allow the supervisor to monitor the activities of the inmates, while a system of louvres in the central tower would prevent the inmates from seeing the supervisor. A rudimentary form of directed loudspeaker would enable the supervisor to communicate with the prisoners. Through not knowing when they were under surveillance, Bentham argued, the inmates would come to assume that they were always under surveillance. This would encourage them to be self-disciplined and well-behaved during their incarceration. The prospect of living in this way would also deter those who visited the prison from wanting to commit crimes. Hence the Panopticon would serve as a deterrent to the inmates from misbehaving or committing future crimes and to general society from committing crimes and finding themselves so incarcerated.

George Orwell’s 1984 extended the Panopticon to encompass the whole of society, or at least the middle classes (Orwell 2004). In this novel the Panopticon became electrical with the invention of the telescreen, a two-way television which allowed the state almost total visual and auditory access to the homes, streets and workplaces of the citizens. As the inmates of the Panopticon were reminded of the supervisor’s presence by the loudspeaker, so citizens in Orwell’s vision were told repeatedly that “Big Brother is watching you”. Orwell used the novel to discuss, among other things, both the reasons of the state for wanting ubiquitous surveillance and the impact that this has on the individual and the nature of a society under ubiquitous surveillance.

The theme of the Panopticon was revisited by Michel Foucault in Discipline and Punish, an overview of the history of prisons and the value they serve (Foucault 1991). Foucault’s particular concern was with the use of power and its increasing bureaucratization in the modern period. His study began with torture and the emphasis on the sovereignty and power of the king. With the Enlightenment the prison was introduced as a more efficient means of punishment, supported by society’s increasing acceptance of the value of discipline beyond merely the military or religious arenas. Oversight became a fundamental tool in enforcing discipline, and so the Panopticon served as both a means of punishment and a form of discipline of the inmates, owing to the seemingly persistent gaze of the supervisor. With time, Foucault argued, the prison was combined with the workhouse and the hospital to simultaneously deprive inmates of their freedom whilst attempting to discipline and reform them.

Aside from Foucault’s comments on the nature of prisons and their value in society, his reference to the Panopticon introduced the concept to a new generation of scholars unfamiliar with Bentham’s penal theories. As such it is the Panopticon read through the lens of Foucault, along with Orwell’s dystopian vision, that came to dominate early discussions of surveillance and its impact on society and the individual.

2. Recent History

While Bentham/Foucault and Orwell successfully raised questions about the value and harms of surveillance, these had limited impact in many philosophy departments. As such there is little written on the ethics of surveillance from a strictly philosophical perspective. However, the interest sparked by Foucault, coupled with recent advances in technology, has led to a questioning of the role surveillance plays in contemporary society. This questioning has been increasingly reflected in academia with the creation of the inter-disciplinary field of Surveillance Studies, bringing together sociologists, jurists, political scientists, geographers, and increasingly philosophers, to consider issues connected with and arising from surveillance.

Although there may be a degree of continuity with earlier forms of surveillance, the “new surveillance” (Marx 1998) introduced by technological advances adds degrees of complexity and mobility with which society has not been faced before. Closed Circuit Television (CCTV) cameras offer a potentially ubiquitous gaze and a hidden, anonymous watcher akin to the Panopticon on a hitherto unimaginable scale. Wireless networks transmit vast quantities of information on systems vulnerable to intercept. The Internet has seen the creation of virtual identities, “data doubles” – reflections of the “real” person in cyberspace – which are vulnerable to abuse and theft; online storing of medical, banking and other personal data which may be hacked or simply lost by the institution responsible; and the increased commodification of personal information by web sites which sell that data to advertising companies or governments. In each of these cases not only are the technology and services offered new but the nature of the technology means that almost limitless information can be collected, stored indefinitely and returned to or searched at will.

Taken together these issues have moved on the discussion from analogies drawn with the Panopticon or 1984. While each maintains rhetorical force, the computerization of society has rendered them limited in their ability to capture the complexities of contemporary surveillance, still less the benefits and harms that it can bring. Furthermore, both the Panopticon and Big Brother are authoritarian and negative images which lend weight to the suggestion that surveillance is always unethical or problematic. However, this is not the case. There are instances in which surveillance can be not only justified but even embraced by the surveilled. Surveillance is itself an ethically neutral concept. What determines the ethical nature of a particular instance of surveillance will be the considerations which follow, such as justified cause, the means employed, and questions of proportionality. Before turning to these, however, we will discuss the areas of life most impacted by surveillance: Privacy, trust and autonomy.

3. Privacy

One of the core arguments against surveillance is that it poses a threat to privacy, which is of value to the individual and to society. This raises a number of questions about privacy, what it is and to what extent and why it is valuable.

Much of the early work on privacy was carried out in the legal realm, particularly in the United States. Warren and Brandeis’ The Right to Privacy (Warren and Brandeis 1890) is generally taken as the first attempt to define the concept of privacy. Here the authors claim that the right to privacy is an instance of the “right to be let alone” and establish limits to that right, arguing that it is not absolute. Developments in technology then gave rise to defining legal cases, such as Katz v. United States (1967) which related privacy and surveillance to the Fourth Amendment of the US Constitution (forbidding unreasonable search and seizure by the state). Eisenstadt v. Baird (1972) then established that the right to privacy involved the right to make important choices without government intervention, drawing a connection between privacy and autonomy. This was drawn upon in Roe vs. Wade (1972) to argue for a woman’s rights in abortion.

In the aftermath of these legal decisions the concept of privacy was increasingly debated by philosophers. Judith Jarvis Thomson (Thomson 1975) argued that the right to privacy consists of a cluster of rights which overlap with both property rights and rights of the person. She held that there are no privacy rights which do not overlap with clusters of other rights, and so there is no distinct right to privacy. A violation of someone’s right to privacy only occurs when one of these other rights has also been violated in a relevant manner. Hence the illicit viewing of another’s diary involves a breach of his right to dispose of his property as he sees fit; extracting information through torture involves a violation of someone’s right not to be injured. In both cases there is a violation of a person’s privacy, but this is only because other, more fundamental rights have been violated.

Thomas Scanlon (Scanlon 1975) responded by arguing that Thomson’s analysis was convoluted and counter-intuitive. Instead he proposed that we have socially-defined zones of privacy which enable us to act with the assumption that we are not being monitored. These zones are motivated by our interest in not having to be alert to specific observation at all times. James Rachels (Rachels 1975), responding to both Thomson and Scanlon, argued that privacy was rather a matter of relationships. In defining our relationships with others, we use varying degrees of privacy to establish intimacy. With a stranger we uphold a high degree of privacy, whilst with a close family member we may have and expect much less privacy. Indeed, he argued, what it means to be a friend is for the relationship to involve less privacy than would otherwise be the case.

More recently W.A. Parent (Parent 1983) argued that privacy involved the control of undocumented information about oneself. This has been contested by Jeffrey Reimann (Reiman 2004) and Tony Doyle (Doyle 2009), who hold that privacy is not restricted to information. A porn star whose body is freely available for all to see may still have his or her privacy violated if spied upon in his or her own home. Daniel Nathan (Nathan 1990) and Danah Boyd (Boyd 2010) agree with Parent that control is an important issue, while Herman Tavani and James Moor (Tavani and Moor 2001) hold that privacy relates more accurately to the access another has to me than to who controls the information about me.

Despite the disagreements, most would agree that on an individual level, privacy affords us the space to be ourselves and to define ourselves through giving us a degree of autonomy and protecting our dignity. In our interactions with others we may define the intimacy of our relationships with them through the amount of privacy we relinquish in that relationship. As we engage with society at large we gain confidence and security from our privacy, safe that those we do not know do not in turn know all about us. We fear the stranger and what they might do if they knew our vulnerabilities. Through keeping those vulnerabilities private, we maintain a level of personal safety.

Privacy is also of value to society at large. As noted, we may appear in public safe in the knowledge that our weaknesses are not on display for all to see, allowing for confident personal interaction. When we vote we do so in the belief that no-one can see our decision and treat us well or poorly in the light of how we voted. Privacy is thus important in the social context of democracy. In many cases we do not want to know everything about everyone around us and so privacy can protect the rest of us from being exposed to too much information. Thanks to a level of anonymity I may also feel emboldened to speak out publicly against corruption or injustice, or simply to be more creative in self-expression. Many of these benefits can be seen through the contrast with states employing high levels of surveillance, such as the former German Democratic Republic. Here the surveillance carried out by the Ministerium für Staatssicherheit (Stasi) was instrumental in quashing open dissent and enforcing the behavioural uniformity foreseen by Orwell (Funder 2004).

There is also of a tension between the safety of the individual as granted by his or her privacy, and the safety of the community which comes from denying the individual his or her privacy. On the most basic level, I feel safest if you know nothing about me but I know everything about you. This is reversed from your perspective, leading to the tension of balancing privacy against security. This balance suggests that it may be morally justifiable to deny one person’s privacy in the interests of the security of the community, although it is by no means always clear when these situations might arise.

4. Trust and Autonomy

Linked closely to the issue of privacy is that of trust. As highlighted by Rachels (Rachels 1975), privacy is often held in an inverse relationship to trust such that the more trust exists between two people, the less need there is for privacy. This is not universally true as intimate partners may still lock the bathroom door. Nonetheless committed relationships are often marked by a higher degree of trust and a reduced level of privacy. When one of those elements is breached, either through intruding on (limited) privacy or through a breaking of trust, the relationship is damaged. One reflection of diminished trust in a relationship is increased surveillance, as when suspicious partners hire private investigators to determine an infidelity. Conversely, the discovery of increased surveillance, especially when the surveilled party is innocent, may also lead to decreased levels of trust. At a personal level trust is often reciprocal: Why should I trust you if you don’t trust me? The discovery of surveillance could well therefore damage personal relationships.

Surveillance also limits the opportunity to present oneself in the manner of one’s own choosing. It is hence limiting on the individual’s autonomy, impacting how that individual interacts with the world. While Bentham believed the Panopticon would encourage inmates to self-discipline, this would only occur through fear of repercussions. The inmates would be denied the opportunity to demonstrate willingness to reform without the surveillance. There would therefore be no opportunities for the supervisor of the prison to place his trust in the prisoner, nor for that prisoner to demonstrate his trustworthiness other than in the presence of surveillance. Any traits displayed would then arguably not be genuine reflections of the character of the inmate. The same is true of surveillance in the workplace, schools and society at large. If the surveilled is suspicious of or conscious of the surveillance then they might conform to the expected norm, but this will not necessarily reflect their character.

Surveillance therefore diminishes the need to trust the surveilled person. Its presence will pressure that person to conform and so render his actions more predictable. Furthermore, as in the Panopticon, if he does not conform there is the chance he will be subject to sanctions. Surveilled people therefore can become more predictable if they fear reprisals for acting in ways that merit the disapproval of the surveillant. In that sense they are therefore more trustworthy (an authority can trust that they will act in such a manner). If the purpose of surveillance is to control or deter people, then surveillance of which the subject is aware could be effective. If, on the other hand, the purpose is to assess the character of people as that character is expressed in integrity, then surveillance of which the subject is aware will be of little help.

We have seen the impacts of surveillance on privacy, trust and autonomy. We are now in a position to consider when surveillance may be justified in spite of (or because of) those impacts.

5. Cause

The purpose of surveillance, or one particular instantiation of surveillance, is probably the most fundamental ethical question that can be asked on this subject. We may think of security as an obvious response, especially as it concerns state surveillance in the form of espionage, or in the form of security cameras surrounding particular buildings. In a sense this throws the question back one degree to ask whether security, or this degree of security, is justified under the circumstances. This will then hinge in part on who it is that is carrying out the surveillance and in part on whom they are monitoring. Is state surveillance of political dissidents, for instance, really necessary for state security?

Security isn’t the only use of surveillance, however. Many retail establishments use surveillance for the mutual benefit of themselves and their customers. Loyalty cards in supermarkets enable the stores to see who is buying which goods and build up detailed pictures of their customer base. Customers participate in this surveillance in return for exclusive deals. Frequent users receive special offers either to widen their shopping experience or to encourage loyalty to the particular store.

Efficiency savings such as these are not limited to retail. They also apply on public and private transport when smart cards enable a person to use the subway or a toll road without using cash. They can aid the rapid transfer of information regarding a person’s health if they fall ill or have an accident when away from home. Security and customer benefit may also come together as, for example, when credit cards are suspended following atypical spending habits of the user. This might also be the case if law enforcement agencies find that they need to establish an alibi or build a profile of a suspect.

Finally there is the possibility of using surveillance for personal gain. This might be financial or emotional, but can extend to other reasons. An unethical computer hacker might break into a website to steal credit card numbers which she can then use for her own ends. Alternatively a Peeping Tom might steal up to someone’s window with voyeuristic intent, or an ex-spouse might seek to gain incriminating information in order to secure custody of their child (Allen 2008).

While issues of simple personal gain which involve violating the privacy of another seem to be unacceptable, although there might be exceptions, questions of security and efficiency are less clear-cut. Many choose to opt-in to supermarket or transport surveillance precisely for the benefits that these systems offer, despite the intensely personal knowledge of the customer that the store can gain from these interactions. In the case of state security the questions often fall along the lines of how far should the privacy of the few be sacrificed for the security of the many. As shall be seen when we come to consider social sorting, however, questions of distribution also arise: Who stands to gain and who to lose from a particular instance of surveillance?

Consent is a major consideration in the justification of surveillance, and particularly the cause of surveillance. If I invite you into my home I am consenting for you to see me in a context which would hitherto have been private and secluded from you. In the popular game show Big Brother contestants consented to being monitored round the clock for up to three months. This does not appear to be problematic from the perspective of the surveillance. As noted above, we do not feel an imposition has occurred if we choose to take up a supermarket’s offer of a loyalty card and the convenience that it brings. We might, however, object strongly if it transpires that the store has been monitoring the spending of individuals without such cards by recording their credit card usage and correlating this with itemised receipts.

While consent can justify surveillance, however, the lack of consent does not automatically thereby invalidate it. Law enforcement does not need to seek the consent of the criminals it wishes to monitor to accumulate evidence against them, nor does the state need to gain consent of those who are genuine threats to its security. As such, we must look to justifiable causes for non-consensual surveillance.

One justification often given for large-scale surveillance is the consequentialist appeal to the greater good. This might apply when the security of the community is best served by monitoring some or all in that community. If the community in question is a state then the numbers involved will be too great to realistically gain complete acceptance of the surveillance by every citizen. As such the state may then appeal to the benefits that will come to more people as a result of the surveillance to justify the imposition.

Deontologists are likely to resist this justification as it implies that the rights of the few may be overridden by the interests of the many. A deontological justification will look rather to the entity to be surveilled and ask what it is about that entity that means it deserves or is in some way liable to be monitored in this way. Given the aforementioned harms of surveillance, there must be a good reason as to why this person or group should be exposed to those harms.

In practice, justifications for surveillance often include both consequentialist and deontological considerations. Hence state security is justified in both protecting the majority and focusing its attention on particular wrongdoers who pose a threat to that majority. Similarly, CCTV in the public square is justified in providing peace of mind to the general public by monitoring all, but targeting only particular individuals or groups who are believed to pose a threat.

The type of surveillance might also have a bearing on whether a consequentialist or deontological justification is sought. CCTV, which is indiscriminate in whom it monitors, lends itself to a consequentialist perspective. In shopping malls the majority of people surveilled by CCTV have done nothing wrong and have no intention of wrongdoing. Nonetheless, the benefits which CCTV brings in detecting the minority of wrongdoers and punishing them may be taken to justify the surveillance of all. By contrast, a more discriminating form of surveillance, such as tapping a suspect’s telephone, lends itself more to a deontological approach. If a person has given an authority such as the police reasonable suspicion to believe he has committed a crime, so he has rendered himself liable to be monitored in this way.

Finally, differences between deontologists and consequentialists emerge in opposition to surveillance. Deontologists will typically find surveillance less acceptable when it violates certain rights of individuals such as the right to privacy. By contrast, consequentialists will tend to be more sanguine about concerns with individual rights in favour of overall costs and benefits to society. If a particular instance of surveillance can be shown to improve the wellbeing of society, albeit at the cost of the privacy of a few individuals, then consequentialists are less likely to see this as problematic than deontologists.

6. Authority

Much of the justification of surveillance, and particularly the cause of that surveillance, will depend on who it is that is carrying out the surveillance. State security can and should be carried out by state intelligence agencies. By contrast it should not be carried out by journalists or foreign aid workers, who need to maintain a level of neutrality in order to carry out their work effectively. If this is the role of state intelligence agencies then those agencies would not be justified in the surveillance of domestic employers to ensure that they are not abusing their workforce. This should rather be the domain of domestic law enforcement.

State surveillance of genuine enemies of the state is one of the less controversial elements of surveillance. Even here, though, it is important to be clear as to precisely whose security is being guarded: That of the state or of those currently empowered to run the state? When the protests occurred in Tiananmen Square in 1989, were the protestors challenging 1) the security of China, 2) the security of the Communist Party running China or 3) the security of those individuals leading the Communist Part of China? To what extent was China the Communist Party and how much of the identity of the state is tied up with those who run the state?

The decision to employ surveillance does not lie entirely with the state, although the state may chose to regulate the use of surveillance. Employers sometimes monitor their employees, either to prevent theft or whistle-blowing or to ensure that they are working to their maximum ability. Retailers, as noted above, monitor customer spending habits to improve efficiency and sales. Parents monitor sleeping infants so as to respond should the child wake in the night. Private investigators might engage in surveillance to establish infidelity, while Peeping Toms might do so for kicks. While it might be felt that the investigator is justified and the Peeping Tom is not, what of the case when the private investigator is attempting to establish infidelity and simultaneously enjoying his work a little too much?

In each case the ethical authority to carry out surveillance is intimately linked to the justifying cause of that surveillance. Hence an individual is justified in carrying out surveillance of his property if it is to secure the property from theft, but not if it is to spy on his tenants. Parents are justified (indeed, often expected) to monitor their infant children as they sleep, but whether they are also justified in monitoring the babysitter watching over their children is far more controversial. Groups of people are justified in watching their street, particularly if it has been subject to a recent spate of theft, through Neighbourhood Watch schemes, but not in intimidating an unpopular neighbour through persistent overt surveillance. This is not to suggest that intention alone can justify surveillance. A landlord might wish to secure his property by placing a camera in the bathroom (lest a burglar enter through the window). While his intention might not be to spy on his tenants the effect will be precisely that. Similarly, baby monitors left in areas where they are likely to record intimate phone conversations of a babysitter are still an invasion of the babysitter’s privacy, irrespective of the parents’ intentions.

7. Necessity

Necessity is often cited as an important condition for justified surveillance. Article 8 of the European Union Convention on Human Rights, for example, states that “there shall be no interference by a public authority with the exercise of this right [to privacy] except such as is in accordance with the law and is necessary in a democratic society in the interests of national security, public safety or the economic well-being of the country, for the prevention of disorder or crime, for the protection of health or morals, or for the protection of the rights and freedoms of others” (Council of Europe 1950). We shall discuss proportionality and discrimination below. Here we shall focus on what is meant by necessity in the context of surveillance.

When is surveillance necessary, though? Should surveillance, like war, be a matter of last resort? If so, when is that moment of last resort reached?

The concept of necessity can limit surveillance from being undertaken arbitrarily or prematurely. An authority may not monitor anyone at any time. Surveillance must rather be required by the circumstances of the case. However, this is simply to replace “necessary” with “required” and so does not help. We are still left with the question as to when surveillance is required by the circumstances of the case.

John Lango (Lango 2006) has suggested two criteria for necessity: The feasibility standard and the awfulness standard. The first occurs when there is sufficient evidence to suggest that there is no feasible alternative, the second when the alternatives are worse than the proposed course of action. When one of these criteria is met the action may be deemed necessary. Given the harms of surveillance, it should therefore be avoided if there are less harmful alternatives. However, surveillance becomes necessary when either there is no alternative, or when the alternatives such as physical intrusion or arrest are more harmful than the surveillance itself.

8. Means

How surveillance is carried out is a further consideration which should be taken into account. Is the surveillance proportionate to its aim and is it discriminate in whom it targets? Proportionality of action is a familiar concept in legal and military ethics, but it has application to surveillance as well. We might return to the images of Big Brother or the Panopticon to picture scenarios in which surveillance is total and unending, and the horror which this often arouses in our minds. In these cases it is hard to imagine the occasioning justification which would see such surveillance as a proportionate response. Even major wars do not justify the perpetual monitoring of all citizens around the clock.

More recent, non-fictional cases exist in the surveillance of school children through using fingerprinting technology either to grant entrance and egress from the school, or to pay for school lunches. While the former case might be seen as providing protection to the children from those who should not be in the school, the latter seems highly invasive and an extreme manner to respond to playground bullies stealing lunch money or parents’ desire to know what food their children are eating. Similar questions have been raised about the full-body screening of airline passengers which was introduced in 2009 in the US and the UK, leading to monochrome “nude” images of all those who went through the scanners. Irrespective of health concerns associated with the scanners, they were seen by many to be extremely invasive of privacy without offering a concomitant level of security to those flying on the airline.

If proportionality questions the depth, or intrusiveness of surveillance, discrimination considers its breadth. It asks how many people are likely to be monitored as a result of the particular form of surveillance. Some aspects of surveillance, such as wire tapping, are highly discriminating and target only those using the particular phone under observation. Others, such as CCTV in public places, are broadly indiscriminate and collect information about a great number of people, only some of which will be of interest to the surveillant. We may ask if there is an onus on the surveillant to be as discriminating as possible and only collect information or invade the privacy of as few people as absolutely necessary, given the confines of what is reasonably possible.

A related question is whether any form of surveillance should be absolutely prohibited. Possible candidates for impermissible surveillance would be that of public toilets or private bedrooms. However even here it would appear as if there are cases when these might become of critical importance to justifying causes, such as state security. This might occur if a civil servant with access to state secrets is believed to be involved in a sexual liaison with a member of a foreign intelligence agency. Less exotically, an organised crime syndicate might use a public toilet as a dead letter drop for passing drugs, guns or money. In each of these cases it might be felt that the perhaps obvious places for banning surveillance could in fact become legitimate contexts. In these cases, however, it would be important to protect the innocent as much as possible by limiting the intrusion. Film which is not useful as evidence should be promptly deleted; the monitoring of toilets should be carried out by a member of the same sex; and if possible software should be used which grants anonymity to all captured on film by default and can only reveal individual details upon request.

9. Social Sorting

Much of the discussion surrounding the ethics of surveillance concerns threats to individual or group privacy, and the balance of power between the individual and the state or the individual’s employers. There is a further potential harm of surveillance in the form of social sorting (Lyon 2002). The purpose of surveillance, it is argued, is to sort people into categories for ends which are either good or ill. The danger, however, is that social stereotypes are carried over into these categories and may even be enshrined and institutionalized in them. As a result particular forms of surveillance might serve to have real impact on people’s life chances owing to such institutionalized prejudice. For example, a recent study found that CCTV operators were disproportionately monitoring the young, the male and ethnic minorities “for no obvious reason” (Norris & Armstrong 1999). That is, in the absence of suspicious behaviour they were choosing to focus their attention on these categories of people. The result is that anyone falling into these categories is more likely to be caught if doing something wrong than someone else, thus perpetuating the stereotype. Furthermore, as these groups were being watched more frequently than others, they were more likely to be seen as doing something suspicious. This in turn could lead to disproportionate response rates by security forces on the ground, contributing to a sense of alienation and rejection by society.

10. Function Creep

Function creep (Winner 1977) involves extending the use of a technology from the cause for which it was initially intended to a different cause. This is readily seen in the use of identity cards in the UK, introduced in the 1939 National Registration Act for the purposes of security, national service and rationing. By 1950 the same cards were being used by 39 government agencies for reasons as diverse as collecting parcels from the post office to routine police enquiries. While any or even all of these were arguably justified, few could be justified under the terms of the initial Act. It was a combination of protest and the eventual recognition of this extension of use which led to the abolition of the Act that same year.

It is not just an extension of surveillance technology which can count as function creep but also an extension of the information retrieved by that technology. CCTV may be installed in a public transport hub in order to better ease traffic flows and predict suicides in order to facilitate timely intervention. In the event of a terrorist atrocity occurring in that hub, though, the same images can be used to identify the terrorist and the means of carrying out the atrocity. In this way function creep can be seen to be complex in its application: Its new use might be fully justifiable. What is problematic is the application of the technology in a new area in one instance leading to its regular and repeated use in that area, especially when this extension has not been subject to ethical scrutiny.

11. Distance

Surveillance typically puts a distance between the surveillant and the person or group surveilled. This can be of benefit to both as it removes the surveillant from the immediacy of the situation and may provide her with time and space to deliberate before reacting to a situation. It might also mean that she does not feel personally threatened in a situation and so react more calmly than would otherwise be the case. However it also simplifies everyday levels of human interaction such as negotiation, discretion, and the use of subtlety: From the surveillant’s perspective someone is either a target or not, and the surveilled subject is not given a platform to respond. This is a concern which is exacerbated by the automation of surveillance and threat detection as the software operating the surveillance can only see people in these terms. There is a further concern that the distance between operator and subject means that the two might never meet. Yet without personal confrontation an operator with social prejudices may never be challenged in her views. She might never meet a person from an ethnic minority (or not one from the minority of which she is suspicious) and so fail to be challenged in her view that all members of that social group are, by virtue of their membership, inherently worthy of suspicion.

12. Chilling Effects

International law states that people have certain human rights, such as the right to free speech, the right to association and the right to protest (United Nations 1948). Suspicion as to a state’s motives, however, may lead to cynicism as to how the state will employ its surveillance technology in self-protection. Even if there is no evidence of wrong-doing the state may nonetheless choose to keep records on those who publicly confess to a certain belief, or who choose to associate with those whom the state believes pose a threat. These records may then be used against citizens at a later date by the state, or by a future iteration of the state if the individuals running the executive change. The knowledge of the accumulation and possession of these records by the state may disincline some citizens from engaging in these legitimate activities, preferring to keep their heads down and avoid notice by the state. These so-called “chilling effects” are at odds with human rights and democratic practice and can lead to behavioural uniformity and a stifling of creativity. In certain dictatorial regimes this may be seen as advantageous. Again one can return to Orwell’s 1984 for a dystopian vision of chilling effects (see also Funder 2004).

13. Power

Throughout this article there has been a recurring theme of power. Through the act of surveillance the surveillant gains power over the surveilled, either through the gathering of information regarding that person which they would rather keep secret (or, at least, keep control over its distribution), or through distancing the person and treating them as acceptable or unacceptable for whatever is the purpose of that surveillance. The balance of power between individuals, or between individuals and groups such as employers or the state, is therefore an important consideration in assessing what it is that is wrong or dangerous about many forms of surveillance.

If we return to the parental monitoring of infants, the context is one of the empowered over the powerless and the cause of the monitoring is paternal care. As noted, this is often seen as a duty of the parent and so one which is justified. As children grow and become more independent, however, they require less care and gain an increasingly strong claim to their own privacy. This is true of surveillance in general as it transfers power from the surveilled to the surveillant. When consent is given then this is more, although possibly not always, justifiable. In the absence of consent, however, this disempowerment of the individual is highly problematic, threatening their dignity and ultimately their responsibility for their own lives.

14. References and Further Reading

Allen, A.L. (2008). “The Virtuous Spy: Privacy as an Ethical Limit”, The Monist 91.1: 3-22.
Bentham, J. (1995). The Panopticon Writings. Verso Books.
Boyd, D. (2010). “Making Sense of Privacy and Publicity”. SXSW. Austin, Texas, March 13.
Council of Europe (1950). Convention for the Protection of Human Rights and Fundamental Freedoms as amended by Protocols No. 11 and No. 14.
Doyle, T. (2009). “Privacy and Perfect Voyeurism”. Ethics and Information Technology 11: 181-189.
Foucault, M. (1991). Discipline and Punish: The Birth of the Prison new edn., Penguin.
Funder, A. (2004). Stasiland: Stories from Behind the Berlin Wall new edn., Granta Books.
Lango, J. (2006). “Last Resort and Coercive Threats: Relating a Just War Principle to a Military Practice”. Joint Services Conference on Professional Ethics.
Lyon, D. (2002). Surveillance as Social Sorting: Privacy, Risk and Automated Discrimination, Routledge.
Marx, G.T. (1998). “Ethics for the New Surveillance”. The Information Society 14: 171-185.
Nathan, D. (1990). “Just Looking: Voyeurism and the Grounds of Privacy”. Public Affairs Quarterly 4.4: 365-386.
Norris, C. and Armstrong, G. (1999). “CCTV and the Social Structuring of Surveillance”. In K. Painter and N. Tilley, eds. Surveillance of Public Space: CCTV, Street Lighting and Crime Prevention, Crime Prevention Studies, Monsey, New York, Criminal Justice Press: 157-78.
Orwell, G. (2004). 1984 Nineteen Eighty-Four new edn., Penguin Classics.
Parent, W.A. (1983). “Privacy, Morality and the Law”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 12.4: 269-288.
Rachels, J. (1975). “Why Privacy is Important”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 323-333.
Reiman, J. (2004). “Driving to the Panopticon: A Philosophical Exploration of the Risks to Privacy Posted by the Information Technology of the Future”. In Privacies: Philosophical Evaluations, Stanford, Stanford University Press.
Scanlon, T. (1975). “Thomson on Privacy”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 315-322.
Tavani, H.T. and Moor, J.H. (2001). “Privacy Protection, Control of Information, and Privacy-Enhancing Technologies”. Computers and Society 31.1: 6-11.
Thomson, J.J. (1975). “The Right to Privacy”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 295-314.
United Nations (1948). “The Universal Declaration of Human Rights”.
Warren, S.D. and Brandeis, L.D. (1890). “The Right to Privacy”. Harvard Law Review: 1-19.
Winner, L. (1977). Autonomous Technology: Technics-out-of-control as a Theme for Political Thought, The MIT Press.

Author Information

Kevin Macnish
Email: Kevin.Macnish@gmail.com
University of Leeds
United Kingdom

Thrasymachus (fl. 427 B.C.E.)

Thrasymachus of Chalcedon is one of several “older sophists” (including Antiphon, Critias, Hippias, Gorgias, and Protagoras) who became famous in Athens during the fifth century B.C.E. We know that Thrasymachus was born in Chalcedon, a colony of Megara in Bithynia, and that he had distinguished himself as a teacher of rhetoric and speechwriter in Athens by the year 427. Beyond this, relatively little is known about his life and works. Thrasymachus’ lasting importance is due to his memorable place in the first book of Plato‘s Republic. Although it is not quite clear whether the views Plato attributes to Thrasymachus are indeed the views the historical person held, Thrasymachus’ critique of justice has been of considerable importance, and seems to represent moral and political views that are representative of the Sophistic Enlightenment in late fifth century Athens.

In ethics, Thrasymachus’ ideas have often been seen as the first fundamental critique of moral values. Thrasymachus’ insistence that justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger seems to support the view that moral values are socially constructed and are nothing but the reflection of the interests of particular political communities. Thrasymachus can thus be read as a foreshadowing of Nietzsche, who argues as well that moral values need to be understood as socially constructed entities. In political theory, Thrasymachus has often been seen as a spokesperson for a cynical realism that contends that might makes right.

Life and Sources
Doctrines
Influence
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Sources

The precise years of Thrasymachus’ birth and death are hard to determine. According to Dionysius, he is younger than Lysias, who Dionysius falsely believed to be born in 459 B.C.E. Aristotle places him between Tisias and Theodorus, but he does not list any precise dates. Cicero mentions Thrasymachus several times in connection with Gorgias and seems to imply that Gorgias and Thrasymachus were contemporaries. A precise reference date for Thrasymachus’ life is provided by Aristophanes, who makes fun of him in his first play Banqueters. That play was performed in 427, and we can conclude therefore that he must have been teaching in Athens for several years before that. One of the surviving fragments of Thrasymachus’ writing (Diels-Kranz Numbering System 85b2) contains a reference to Archelaos, who was King of Macedonia from 413-399 B.C.E. We thus can conclude that Thrasymachus was most active during the last three decades of the fifth century.

2. Doctrines

The remaining fragments of Thrasymachus’ writings provide few clues about his philosophical ideas. They either deal with rhetorical issues or they are excerpts from speeches (DK 85b1 and b2) that were (probably) written for others and thus can hardly be seen as the expression of Thrasymachus’ own thoughts. The most interesting fragment is DK 85b8. It contains the claim that the gods do not care about human affairs since they do not seem to enforce justice. Scholars have, however, been divided whether this claim is compatible with the position Plato attributes to Thrasymachus in the first book of the Republic. Plato’s account there is by far the most detailed, though perhaps historically suspect, evidence for Thrasymachus’ philosophical ideas.

In the first book of the Republic, Thrasymachus attacks Socrates’ position that justice is an important good. He claims that ‘injustice, if it is on a large enough scale, is stronger, freer, and more masterly than justice’ (344c). In the course of arguing for this conclusion, Thrasymachus makes three central claims about justice.

Justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger (338c)
Justice is obedience to laws (339b)
Justice is nothing but the advantage of another (343c).

There is an obvious tension among these three claims. It is far from clear why somebody who follows legal regulations must always do what is in the interest of the (politically) stronger, or why these actions must serve the interests of others. Scholars have tried to resolve these tensions by emphasizing one of the three claims at the expense of the other two.

First, there are those scholars (Wilamowitz 1920, Zeller 1889, and Strauss 1952) who take (1) as the central element of Thrasymachus’ thinking about justice. According to this view, Thrasymachus is an advocate of natural right who claims that it is just (by nature) that the strong rule over the weak. This interpretation stresses the similarities between Thrasymachus’ arguments and the position Plato attributes to Callicles in the Gorgias.

A second group of scholars (Hourani 1962, and Grote 1850) emphasizes the importance of (2) and contends that Thrasymachus advocates a form of legalism. According to this interpretation, Thrasymachus is a relativist who denies that justice is anything beyond obedience to existing laws.

A third group (Kerferd 1947, Nicholson 1972) argues that (3) is the central element in Thrasymachus’ thinking about justice. Thrasymachus therefore turns out to be an ethical egoist who stresses that justice is the good of another and thus incompatible with the pursuit of one’s self-interest. Scholars in this group view Thrasymachus primarily as an ethical thinker and not as a political theorist.

In addition, there is a group of scholars (A.E. Taylor 1960, and Burnet 1964) who read Thrasymachus as an ethical nihilist. According to this view, Thrasymachus’ project is to show that justice does not exist. Burnet writes in this context: ‘[Thrasymachus] is the real ethical counterpart to the cosmological nihilism of Gorgias.’

Others (Barney 2004 and Johnson 2005) have stressed that Thrasymachus should not be read as a philosopher who offers precise definitions of justice, but rather as a sociologist or political scientist who offers empirical observations that amount to a cynical commentary on those who follow a traditional, Hesiodic conception of justice.

Finally, there are a number of scholars who claim that Thrasymachus is a confused thinker. Cross and Woozley (1964) contend, for example, that Thrasymachus advances different criteria for justice ‘without appreciating that they do not necessarily coincide.’ This claim has been renewed by Everson (1998). J.P. Maguire (1971) argues that only some of the arguments in book I of the Republic are Thrasymachus’ own, while other ideas are falsely attributed to Thrasymachus by Plato in order to prepare the ground for his own arguments.

3. Influence

In spite of the disagreement about how to interpret Thrasymachus’ arguments in book I of the Republic, his ideas have been influential in ethical and political theory. In ethics, Thrasymachus’ ideas have often been seen as the first fundamental critique of moral values. Thrasymachus’ insistence that justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger seems to support the view that moral values are socially constructed and are nothing but the reflection of the interests of particular political communities. Thrasymachus can thus be read as a foreshadowing of Nietzsche, who argues as well that moral values need to be understood as socially constructed entities. In political theory, Thrasymachus has often been seen as a spokesperson for a cynical realism that contends that might makes right. This view frequently associates Thrasymachus with the arguments Thucydides attributes to the Athenians in their negotiations with the island of Melos (History of the Peloponnesian War, Chapter XVII). Thrasymachus is therefore frequently portrayed as an early version of Machiavelli who argues in The Prince that the true statesman does not recognize any moral constrains in his pursuit of power. In the scholarship on Socrates, Thrasymachus is sometimes seen as an interlocutor who shows the limits of the Socratic elenchus. C.D.C. Reeve (1988) argues, for instance, that the conversation between Socrates and Thrasymachus illustrates that Socratic questioning cannot benefit a person like Thrasymachus, who categorically denies that justice is a virtue. Reeve contends that this limit of the elenctic method provided the impetus why Plato proceeded to modify Socrates’ ethical principles in the remaining books of the Republic.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Diels, Hermann. Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Rev. Walther Kranz. Berlin: Weidmann, 1972-1973.
Plato. Republic. Trans. G.M.A. Grube (rev. C.D.C. Reeve). Indianapolis: Hackett, 1992.
<Sprague, Rosamund Kent, ed. The Older Sophists: A Complete Translation by Several Hands. Columbia SC: University of South Carolina Press, 1972.

b. Secondary Sources

Adkins, A.W.H.Merit and Responsibility: A Study in Greek Values Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1960.
Balot, R.K.Greed and Injustice in Classical Athens Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2001.
Barney, R.”Callicles and Thrasymachus”Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Burnet, J. Greek Philosophy. London: Macmillian, 1964.
Chapell,T.D.J. “The Virtues of Thrasymachus” Phronesis 38 (1993): 1-17
Chapell,T.D.J. “Thrasymachus and Definition” Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 18 (2000): 101-107
Everson, S. “The Incoherence of Thrasymachus” Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 16 (1998): 99-131.
Cross, R.C. and Woozley, A.D. Plato’s Republic. A Philosophical Commentary. London: Macmillian, 1964.
Grote, G. A History of Greece. London: J. Murnay, 1888.
Hourani, C.F. “Thrasymachus’ Definition of Justice in Plato’s Republic” Phronesis 7 (1962): 110-120.
Johnson, C.Socrates and the Immoralists Lanham: Lexington Books, 2005
Kerferd, G.B. “The doctrine of Thrasymachus in Plato’s Republic” Durham Univ. Journal 40 (1947): 19-27.
Kerferd, G. B. The Sophistic Movement. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.
Maguire, J.P. “Thrasymachus…or Plato?” Phronesis 16 (1971):142-163.
Nicholson, P.P. “Unravelling Thrasymachus’ Argument in the Republic” Phronesis 19 (1974): 210-232.
O’Neill, B. “The Struggle for the Soul of Thrasymachus”Ancient Philosophy 8 (1988):167-85.
Reeve, C.D.C. “Socrates meets Thrasymachus” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 67 (1985): 246-265.
Reeve, C.D.C. Philosopher-Kings. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988.
Strauss, L. Natural Right and History. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1952.
Taylor, A.E. Plato, the Man and his Work. London: Methenn, 1960.
White, S.A.”Thrasymachus the Diplomat”Classical Philology 90 (1995): 307-27.
Willamowitz-Moellendorff, U.v. Platon I. Berlin: Weidmann, 1920.
Zeller, E. Outlines of the History of Greek Philosophy. New York: H.Holt, 1889.

Author Information

Nils Rauhut
Email: nrauhut@coastal.edu
Coastal Carolina University
U. S. A.

Johann Wolfgang von Goethe (1749—1832)

Goethe defies most labels, and in the case of the label ‘philosopher’ he did so intentionally. “The scholastic philosophy,” in his opinion, “had, by the frequent darkness and apparent uselessness of its subject- matter, by its unseasonable application of a method in itself respectable, and by its too great extension over so many subjects, made itself foreign to the mass, unpalatable, and at last superfluous” (Goethe 1902, 1: 294). But it is nothing exceptional for a philosopher to disdain the character of what is passed along under the name philosophy by professional academics. If Diogenes, Montaigne, Nietzsche, Wittgenstein, Sartre, or Rorty, can be considered philosophers, then it may even be a rule that to reject the appellation is a condition of having earned it. That said, Goethe is certainly not a philosopher in the sense made popular in his day: a builder of self-grounding systems of thought. Neither is he a philosopher by today’s most common definitions: either a professional analyzer of arguments or a critic of contemporary cultural practices. The paradigm under which Goethe might be classified a philosopher is much older, recalling the ancient and then renaissance conception of the polymath, the man of great learning and wisdom, whose active life serves as the outward expression of his thinking.

In terms of influence, Goethe’s upon Germany is second only to Martin Luther’s. The periods of his dramatic and poetic writing –Sturm und Drang, romanticism, and classicism— simply are the history of the high-culture in Germany from the late eighteenth to the early nineteenth century. Philosophically, his influence is indelible, though not as wide-reaching. His formulation of an organic ontology left its mark on thinkers from Hegel to Wittgenstein; his theory of colors challenged the reigning paradigm of Newton’s optics; and his theory of morphology, that of Linnaeus’ biology.

Life and Works
Philosophical Background
Scientific Background and Influence
Morphology, Compensation, and Polarity
Theory of Colors
Philosophical Influence
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Selected Secondary Scholarship

1. Life and Works

Historical studies should generally avoid the error of thinking that the circumstances of a philosopher’s life necessitate their theoretical conclusions. With Goethe, however, his poetry, scientific investigations, and philosophical worldview are manifestly informed by his life, and are indeed intimately connected with his lived experiences. In the words of Georg Simmel, “…Goethe’s individual works gradually appear to take on less significance than his life as a whole. His life does not acquire the sense of a biography that strings together external phenomena, but is rather like the portrait of a singular vastness, depth and dynamism of existence, the pure expression of an internal vigor in its relation to the world, the spiritualization of an extraordinary sphere of reality,” (Simmel 2007, 85f).

Johann Wolfgang von Goethe was born August 28, 1749 in Frankfurt, Germany. His father was the Imperial Councillor Johann Kaspar Goethe (1710-1782) and his mother Katharina Elisabeth (Textor) Goethe (1731-1808). Goethe had four siblings, only one of whom, Cornelia, survived early childhood.

Goethe’s early education was inconsistently directed by his father and sporadic tutors. He did, however, learn Greek, Latin, French, and Italian relatively well by the age of eight. In part to satisfy his father’s hope for material success, Goethe enrolled in law at Leipzig in 1765. There he gained a reputation within theatrical circles while attending the courses of C.F. Gellert. And there he gained notoriety for his extracurricular activities at what would become Faust’s haunt, Auerbach’s Keller. In 1766 he fell in love with Anne Catharina Schoenkopf (1746-1810) and wrote his joyfully exuberant collection of nineteen anonymous poems, dedicated to her simply with the title Annette.

After a case of tuberculosis and two years convalescence, Goethe moved to Strassburg in 1770 to finish his legal degree. There he met Johann Gottfried Herder (1744-1803), unofficial leader of the Sturm und Drang movement. Herder encouraged Goethe to read Homer, Ossian, and Shakespeare, whom the poet credits above all with his first literary awakening. Inspired by a new flame, this time Friederike Brion, he published the Neue Lieder (1770) and his Sesenheimer Lieder (1770-1771). Though set firmly on the path to poetry, he was promoted Licentitatus Juris in 1771 and returned to Frankfurt where with mixed success he opened a small law practice. Seeking greener pastures, he soon after moved to the more liberal city of Darmstadt. Along the road, so the story goes, Goethe obtained a copy of the biography of a noble highwayman from the German Peasants’ War. Within the astounding span of six weeks, he had reworked it into the popular anti-establishment protest, Götz von Berlichingen (1773).

His next composition, Die Leiden des jungen Werther (1774), brought Goethe nearly instant worldwide acclaim. The plot of the book is mostly a synthesis of his friendships with Charlotte Buff (1753-1828) and her fiancé Johann Christian Kestner (1741-1800), and the suicide of Goethe’s friend Karl Wilhelm Jerusalem (1747-1772). It remains the archetype of the Sturm und Drang’s elevation of emotion over reason, disdain for social proprieties, and exhortation for action in place of reflection. Besides Werther, Goethe composed Die Hymnen (among them Ganymed, Prometheus and Mahomets Gesang), and several shorter dramas, among them Götter, Helden und Wieland (1774), and Clavigo (1774).

On the strength of his reputation, Goethe was invited in 1775 to the court of then eighteen-year-old Duke Carl August (1757-1828), who would later become Grand Duke of Saxe-Weimar-Eisenach. Although Weimar was then a village of only six thousand residents, it was in the process of a cultural revolution thanks to the foresight and aesthetic vision of Duchess Anna Amalia (1739-1807), mother of the Duke and matron of the “Court of the Muses.” Goethe became enveloped in court life, where he could turn his limitless curiosity to an astonishing range of civic activities. As court-advisor and special counsel to the Duke, he took directorship of the mining concern, the finance ministry, the war and roads commission, the local theater, not to mention construction of the beautiful Park-am-Ilm. He was eventually granted nobility by Emperor Joseph II, and became Geheimrat of Weimar in 1782.

From 1786 to 1788 Goethe took his Italienische Reise, in part out of his growing enthusiasm for the Winckelmannian rebirth of classicism. There he met the artists Kaufmann and Tischbein, and also Christiane Vulpius (1765–1816), with whom he held a rather scandalous love affair until their eventual marriage in 1806.

Although Goethe had first met Friedrich Schiller (1759-1805) in 1779, when the latter was a medical student in Karlsruhe, there was hardly an immediate friendship between them. When Schiller came to Weimar in 1787, Goethe dismissively considered Schiller an impetuous though undeniably talented upstart. As Goethe wrote to his friend Körner in 1788, “His entire being is just set up differently than mine; our intellectual capacities appear essentially at odds.” After some years of maturation on Schiller’s part and of mellowing on Goethe’s, the two found their creative spirits in harmony. In 1794, the pair became intimate friends and collaborators, and began nothing less than the most extraordinary period of literary production in German history. Working alongside Schiller, Goethe finally completed his Bildungsroman, the great Wilhelm Meisters Lehrjahre (1795-6), as well as his epic Hermann und Dorothea (1796-7) and several balladic pieces. Schiller, for his part, completed the Wallenstein trilogy (1799), Maria Stuart (1800), Die Jungfrau von Orleans (1801), Die Braut von Messina (1803) and Wilhelm Tell (1804). To Goethe’s great sorrow and regret, Schiller died at the height of his powers on April 29, 1805. Of their collaboration’s historical importance, Alfred Bates commemorates, “Schiller and Goethe have ever been inseparable in the minds of their countrymen, and have reigned as twin stars in the literary firmament. If Schiller does not hold the first place he is more beloved, though Goethe is more admired,” (Bates 1906, 11: 75).

Johann Wolfgang von Goethe died on March 22, 1832 in Weimar, having finally finished Faust the previous year. His famous last words were a request that his servant let in “more light.” The prince of poets, Goethe was laid to rest in the Fürstengruft of the Historischer Friedhof in Weimar, side by side with his friend Schiller.

2. Philosophical Background

The Kultfigur of Goethe as the unspoiled and uninfluenced genius is doubtless over-romanticized. Goethe himself gave rise to this myth, both in his conversations with others and in his own quasi-biographical work, Dichtung und Wahrheit (1811-1833). About his study of the history of philosophy, he writes, “one doctrine or opinion seemed to me as good as another, so far, at least, as I was capable of penetrating into it,” (Goethe 1902, 182). Albert Schweitzer, usually even-handed in his attributions, writes, “Goethe borrows nothing from any of the philosophies with which he is in contact. Thanks, however, to his conscientious study of the thought of others, he attains an ever clearer grasp of his own ideas,” (Schweitzer 1949, 70).

Goethe’s way of reading was neither that of the scholar seeking out arguments to analyze nor that of the historian curious about the ideas of the great minds. No disciple of any particular philosopher or system, he instead borrows in a syncretic way from a number of different and even opposing thought systems in the construction of his Weltanschauung. And whenever particular subjects could not be put to practical use, Goethe’s attention quickly moved on. In a rather telling recollection, Goethe characterizes his philosophy lectures thusly, “At first I attended my lectures assiduously and faithfully, but the philosophy would not enlighten me at all. In logic it seemed strange to me that I had so to tear asunder, isolate, and, as it were, destroy, those operations of the mind which I had performed with the greatest ease from my youth upwards, and this in order to see into the right use of them. Of the thing itself, of the world, and of God, I thought I knew about as much as the professor himself; and, in more places than one, the affair seemed to me to come into a tremendous strait. Yet all went on in tolerable order till towards Shrovetide, when, in the neighborhood of Professor Winkler’s house on the Thomas Place, the most delicious fritters came hot out of the pan just at the hour of lecture,” (Goethe 1902, 205). Philosophy apparently held just slightly less interest than good pastry. Notwithstanding this estimation, indelible philosophical influences are nevertheless discernible.

For many intellectuals in Goethe’s generation, Rousseau (1712-78) represented the struggle against the Cartesian mechanistic world view. Rousseau’s elevation of the emotional and instinctual aspects of human subjectivity galvanized the traditional German Wanderlust into a far reaching cry to ‘return to nature’ in terms of a longing for pre-civilized society and pre-Enlightenment efforts to harmonize with rather than conquer nature. Goethe felt this unity with nature keenly in his Sturm und Drang period, something equally evident in Werther’s desire for aesthetic wholeness and in his emotional outbursts. From 1784 to 1804, there is a notable decline in enthusiasm for Rousseau’s privileging emotion over reason, though never an explicit rejection. Some scholars attribute this to Goethe’s participation in the sorts of civic bureaucracies that Rousseau so lamented in modern life. But it is clear that there are philosophical reasons besides these practical ones. Goethe’s classical turn in these years is marked by his view that the fullest life was one that balanced passion and duty, creativity and regulation. Only through the interplay of these oppositions, which Rousseau never came to recognize, could one attain classical perfection.

Although educated in a basically Leibnizian-Wolffian worldview, it was Spinoza (1632-77) from whom Goethe adopted the view that God is both immanent with the world and identical with it. While there is little to suggest direct influence on other aspects of his thought, there are certain curious similarities. Both think that ethics should consist in advice for influencing our characters and eventually to making us more perfect individuals. And both hold that happiness means an inner, almost stoically tranquil superiority over the ephemeral troubles of the world.

Kant (1724-1804) was doubtless the most famous living philosopher of Goethe’s youth. Yet Goethe only came to read him seriously in the late 1780s, and even then only with the help of Karl Reinhold (1757-1823). While he shared with Kant the rejection of externally imposed norms of ethical behavior, his reception was highly ambivalent. In a commemoration for Wieland (1773-1813) he asserts that the Kritik der reinen Vernunft (1781/7) is “a dungeon which restrains our free and joyous excursions into the field of experience.” Like Aristotle before him, Goethe felt the only proper starting point for philosophy was the direct experience of natural objects. Kant’s foray into the transcendental conditions of the possibility of such an experience seemed to him an unnecessary circumvention of precisely that which we are by nature equipped to undertake. The critique of reason was like a literary critique: both could only pale in value to the original creative activity. Concerning Kant’s Kritik der praktischen Vernunft (1788), Goethe was convinced that dicta of pure practical reason, no matter how convincing theoretically, had little power to transform character. Perhaps with Kant’s ethics in mind, he wrote, “Knowing is not enough; we must apply. Willing is not enough; we must do” On the other hand, a letter to Eckermann of April 11, 1827, indicates that he considers Kant to be the most eminent of modern philosophers. And he certainly appreciated Kant’s Kritik der Urteilskraft (1790) for having shown that nature and art each have their ends within themselves purposively rather than as final causes imposed from without.

Influenced in part by Herder’s conception of Einfühlen, Goethe formulated his own morphological method (see below). More the Kantian than Goethe, Herder’s belief in Über den Ursprung der Sprache (1772) that language could be explained naturalistically as a creative impulse within human development rather than a divine gift influenced Goethe’s theoretical work on poetry. And the trace of Herder’s claims about the equal worth of historical epochs and cultures can still be seen in the eclectic art collection in Goethe’s house on Weimar’s Frauenplan.

3. Scientific Background and Influence

Goethe considered his scientific contributions as important as his literary achievements. While few scholars since have shared that contention, there is no doubting the sheer range of Goethe’s scientific curiosity. In his youth, Goethe’s poetry and dramatic works featured the romantic belief in the ‘creative energy of nature’ and evidenced a certain fascination with alchemy. But court life in Weimar brought Goethe for the first time in contact with experts outside his literary comfort zone. His directorship of the silver-mine at nearby Ilmenau introduced him to a group of mineralogists from the Freiburg Mining Academy, led by Johann Carl Voigt (1752-1821). His 1784 discovery of the intermaxillary bone was a result of his study with Jena anatomist Justus Christian Loder (1753-1832). Increasingly fascinated by botany, he studied the pharmacological uses of plants under August Karl Batsch (1761-1802) at the University of Jena, and began an extensive collection of his own. He grew dissatisfied with the system of Linnaeus as an artificial taxonomy of plants, considering it “a shade of a great harmony, which one must study as a whole, otherwise each individual is a dead letter,” (Letter to Knebel, 17 November, 1784).

There is a passionate ambivalence about Goethe’s scientific reputation. He has alternately been received as a universal man of learning whose methods and intuitions have contributed positively to many aspects of scientific discourse, or else denounced as a dilettante incapable of understanding the figures— Linnaeus and Isaac Newton—against whom his work is a feeble attempt to revolt. Goethe’s scientific treatises were neglected by many in the nineteenth century as the amateurish efforts of an otherwise great poet, one who should have stayed within the arena that best suited him. Positivists of the early twentieth century virtually ignored him. Erich Heller claims Goethe “made no contribution to scientific progress or technique,” (Heller 1952, 7). On the other hand, some of the great scientific minds have expressed enthusiastic respect and even approval of Goethe’s contributions, among them Helmholtz, Einstein, and Planck (Cf. Stephenson 1995).

4. Morphology, Compensation, and Polarity

In Goethe’s day, the reigning systematic botanical theory in Europe was that of Carl Linnaeus (1707-1778). Plants were classified according to their relation to each other into species, genera, and kingdom. As an empirical method, Linnaeus’s taxonomy ordered external characteristics — size, number, and location of individual organs — as generic traits. The problem for Goethe was two-fold. Although effective as an organizational schema, it failed to distinguish organic from inorganic natural objects. And by concentrating only on the external characteristics of the plant, it ignored the inner development and transformation characteristic of living things generally. Goethe felt that the exposition of living objects required the same account of inner nature as it did for the account of the inner unity of a person.

Goethe believed that all living organisms bore an inner physiognomic ‘drive to formation’ or Bildungstrieb. In his “First Sketch of a General Introduction into Comparative Anatomy, Starting from Osteology” (1795), Goethe discussed a law binding the action of the Bildungstrieb, that “nothing can be added to one part without subtracting from another, and conversely,” (Goethe 1961-3, 17: 237). This notion of ‘compensation’ bears a likeness to the laws of vital force put forward by Johann Friedrich Blumenbach (1752-1840) and Carl Friedrich Kielmeyer (1765-1844) in the early 1790s. But whereas their versions dealt with the generation and corruption of living beings, Goethe sought the common limitations imposed on organic beings by external nature.

Whereas his earlier romanticism considered nature the raw material on which human emotions could be imparted, Goethe’s studies in botany, mineralogy, and anatomy revealed to him certain common patterns in the development and modifications of natural forms. The name he gave to this new manner of inquiry was ‘morphology’. No static concept, morphology underwent its own metamorphosis throughout Goethe’s career. Morphology is first named as such in Goethe’s notes of 1796. But he only fully lays out the position as an account of the form and transformation of organisms in the 1817 Zur Morphologie. He continued to publish articles in his journal “On Science in General, On Morphology in Particular” from 1817 to 1824. Goethe’s key contention here is that every living being undergoes change according to a compensatory dynamic between the successive stages of its development. In the plant, for example, this determination of each individual member by the whole arises insofar as every organ is built according to the same basic form. As he wrote to Herder on May 17, 1787:

It has become apparent to me that within the organ that we usually address as ‘leaf’ there lies hidden the true Proteus that can conceal and manifest itself in every shape. Any way you look at it, the plant is always only leaf, so inseparably joined with the future germ that one cannot think the one without the other. […]With this model and the key to it, one can then go on inventing plants forever that must follow lawfully; which, even if they don’t exist, still could exist…

Goethe’s morphology, in opposition to the static taxonomy of Linnaeus, studied these perceptible limitations not merely in order to classify plants in a tidy fashion, but as instances of natural generation for the sake of intuiting the inner working of nature itself, whole and entire. Since all organisms undergo a common succession of internal forms, we can intuitively uncover within these changes an imminent ideal of development, which Goethe names the ‘originary phenomenon’ or Urphänomen. These pure exemplars of the object in question are not some abstracted Platonic Idea of the timeless and unchanging essence of the thing, but “the final precipitate of all experiences and experiments, from which it can ever be isolated. Rather it reveals itself in a constant succession of manifestations,” (Goethe 1981, 13: 25). The Urphänomen thus offer a sort of “guiding thread through the labyrinth of diverse living forms,” (Goethe 1961-3, 17: 58), which thereby reveals the true unity of the forms of nature in contrast to the artificially static and lifeless images of Linneaus’ system. Through the careful study of natural objects in terms of their development, and in fact only in virtue of it, we are able to intuit morphologically the underlying pattern of what the organic object is and must become. “When, having something before me that has grown, I inquire after its genesis and measure the process as far back as I can, I become aware of a series of stages, which, though I cannot actually see them in succession, I can present to myself in memory as a kind of ideal whole,” (Goethe 1947ff, I/10: 131).

The morphological method is thus a combination of careful empirical observation and a deeper intuition into the idea that guides the pattern of changes over time as an organism interacts with its environment. Natural observation is the necessary first step of science; but because the senses can only attend to outer forms, a full account of the object also requires an intuition that apprehends an object with the ‘eyes of the mind’. Morphology reveals, “the laws of transformation according to which nature produces one part through another and achieves the most diversified forms through the modification of a single organ,” (Goethe 1961-3, 17: 22). While the visible transformations are apparent naturalistically, the inner laws by which they are necessary are not. They are, in Goethe’s word, dämonisch, apparent intuitively but unable to be explicated more concretely by means of the understanding.

Whereas Linneaus’ taxonomy only considered the sensible qualities of the object, Goethe believed a sufficient explanation must address that object in terms of organic wholeness and development. To do that, the scientist needs to describe the progressive modification of a single part of an object as its modification over time relates to the whole of which it is the part. Considering the leaf as an example of this Urphänomen, Goethe traced its metamorphosis from a seed into the stem, then leaves, then flowers, and finally its stamen or pistil. This continuous development was described by Goethe as an ‘intensification’ or Steigerung of the original form.

The oppositional tension between the creative force and the compensatory limitations within all living things exemplifies the notion of ‘polarity’ or Polarität. In his 1790 essay, “The Metamorphosis of Plants,” Goethe represented the intensification of a plant as the result of the interaction between the nutritive forces of the plant and the organic form of the primal leaf. Polarity between a freely creative impulse and an objectively structuring law is what allows the productive restraint of pure creativity and at the same time the playfulness and innovation of formal rules. Polarity also plays a marked role in Goethe’s Farbenlehre (see below), as the principle of interplay between light and darkness out of which the Urphänomen of color is exhibited. “With light poise and counterpoise, nature oscillates within her prescribed limits, yet thus arise all the varieties and conditions of the phenomena which are presented to us in space and time,” (Goethe 1970, xxxix).

Goethe’s theories of morphology, polarity, and compensation each have their roots in his dramatic and poetic writings. But rather than a fanciful application of an aesthetic doctrine to the nature, Goethe believed that the creativity great artists, insofar as they are great, was a reflection of the purposiveness of nature. After all, “masterpieces were produced by man in accordance with the same true and natural laws as the masterpieces of nature,” (Goethe 1961-3, 11: 435–6). Goethe’s classicism features a similarly polarized intertwining of the unbridled creativity of the artistic drives and the formal rules of technique. As with a plant, the creative forces of life must be guided, trained, and restricted, so that in place of something wild and ungainly can stand a balanced structure which achieves, in both organic nature and in the work of art, its full intensification in beauty. As the work of the botanist is to trace the morphology of an individual according to an ideal Urphänomen, so does it fall to the classical author to intensify his characters within the contextualized polarity of the plot in a way simultaneously unique and yet typical. The early drafts of Torquato Tasso (begun in the 1780s), for example, reveal its protagonist as a veritable force of nature, pouring out torrential feelings upon a conservative and repressed external world. By the time of the published version in 1790, the Sturm und Drang character of Tasso is polarized against the aristocratically reposed and reasonable character of Antonio. Only in conjunction with Antonio can Tasso come into classical fullness and perfection. As the interplay of polarities in nature is the principle of natural wholeness, so is it the principle of equipoise in the classical drama. Polarities are also visible in Wilhelm Meister’s Lehrjahr (1795-6). Again in marked contrast to an earlier version of the text, in the final version Wilhelm’s romantic love of art and theatre is now just one piece of his coming-into-himself, which requires its polar opposite: the restraint inculcated within a conservatively aristocratic society. Only from the polarized tension does his drive to self-formation achieve intensification and eventually classical perfection.

5. Theory of Colors

“As to what I have done as a poet… I take no pride in it… but that in my century I am the only person who knows the truth in the difficult science of colors – of that, I say, I am not a little proud, and here I have a consciousness of a superiority to many,” (Goethe 1930, 302). Coming from the preeminent literary figure of his age, Goethe’s remarkable statement reveals to what extent he considered the Farbenlehre (1810) his life’s true work. At the same time, it was the source of perhaps his greatest disappointment. Like his work on morphology, his theory of colors fell on mostly deaf ears.

As his morphology targeted the system of Linnaeus, Goethe’s Farbenlehre challenged what was then and among the general public still remains the leading view of optics, that of Isaac Newton (1642-1727). However, most of Goethe’s vitriol was not directed at Newton himself, but the dismissive attitudes of his adherents, who would not so much as entertain the possibility that their conceptual framework was inadequate. He compares Newton’s optics, “to an old castle, which was at first constructed by its architect with youthful precipitation […] The same system was pursued by his successors and heirs: their increased wants within, and harassing vigilance of their opponents without, and various accidents compelled them in some place to build nearby, in others in connection with the fabric, and thus to extend the original plan,” (Goethe 1970, xlii). Thus, while Goethe esteems Newton as a redoubtable genius, his issue is with those half-witted apologists who effectively corrupted that very same edifice they fought to defend. His aim is accordingly to, “dismantle it from gable and roof downwards; so that the sun may at last shine into the old nest of rats and owls…” (Goethe 1970, xliii).

As was the case with Linnaeus, Goethe’s guiding criticism of Newton concerned his ostensibly artificial method. Through Newton’s famous experiments with prismatic phenomenon, he discovered that pure light already contained within itself all the colors available to the human visual spectrum. The refraction of pure white light projected at a prism produces the seven individual colors. Pragmatically, this allowed Newton to quantify the angular bending of light beams and to predict which colors would be produced at a given frequency. That frequency could be calculated simply by accounting for the distance between the light source and the prism and again the distance from the prism to the surface upon which the color was projected.

But by reducing the thing itself to its perceptible qualities, the Newtonians had made a grave methodological mistake. The derivative colors produced by the prismatic experiments are identified with the spectrum that appears in the natural world. But since the light has been artificially manipulated to fit the constraints of the experiment, there is no prima facie reason to think that natural light would feature the same qualities. Sending a beam of light through a turbid prismatic medium ─ one among a nearly infinite variety of media ─ produced a reliably quantifiable set of results, but by no means either the only or even an obviously preferable set. In Goethe’s words, “[Newton] commits the error of taking as his premise a single phenomenon, artificial at that, building a hypothesis on it, and attempting to explain with it the most numerous and unlimited phenomena,” (Goethe 1981, 13: 50).

Goethe’s alternative relies upon his ideas of morphology and polarity. Just as the study of a plant had to proceed from the empirical observation of a great variety of particulars in order to intuit the Urphänomen that was common to all of them, so too should a Farbenlehre proceed from as great a variety of natural observations as possible. Whereas Newton universalizes from a controlled and artificial experiment, Goethe thinks “[i]t is useless to attempt to express the nature of a thing abstractedly. Effects we can perceive, and a complete history of those effects would, in fact, sufficiently define the nature of the thing itself. We should try in vain to describe a man’s character, but let his acts be collected and an idea of the character will be presented to us. The colors are acts of lights; its active and passive modifications: thus considered we may expect from them some explanation respecting life itself,” (Goethe 1970, xxxvii). These ‘acts’ of light reveal the same coordinate tension found in the rest of polarized nature. A light beam is no static thing with a substantial ontological status, but an oppositional tension that we perceive only relationally. Through careful observation of their interplay alone do we apprehend color. As defined by Goethe, “color is an elementary phenomenon in nature adapted to the sense of vision; a phenomenon which, like all others, exhibits itself by separation and contrast, by commixture and union, by augmentation and neutralization, by communication and dissolution: under these general terms its nature may be best comprehended,” (Goethe 1970, liv). Color arises from the polarity of light and darkness. Darkness is not the absence of light, as both Newton and most contemporary theorists believe, but its essential antipode, and thereby an integral part of color.

Through a series of experiments on his thesis that color is really the interplay of light and dark, Goethe discovered a peculiarity that seemed to confute the Newtonian system. If Newton is right that color is the result of dividing pure light, then there should be only one possible order to the spectrum, according to the frequency of the divided light. But there are clearly two ways to produce a color spectrum: with a light beam projected in a dark room, and with a shadow projected within a lighted room. Something bright, seen through something turbid, appears yellow. If the turbidity of the medium gradually increases, then what had appeared as yellow passes over into yellowish-red and eventually into bright-red as its frequency proportionally decreases. Something dark, seen through something turbid, appears blue; with a decreasing turbity, it appears violet. The color produced also depends upon the color of the material on which the light or shadow is cast. If a white light is projected above a dark boundary, the light extends a blue-violet edge into the dark area. A shadow projected above a light boundary, on the other hand, yields a red-yellow edge. When the distances between the projection and the surface are increased, the boundaries will eventually overlap. Done in a lighted room, the result of the overlap is green. The same procedure conducted in a dark room, however, produces magenta. If Newton was correct that only the bending of the light beam affects the given color, then neither the relative brightness of the room, the color of the background, nor the introduction of shadow should have altered the resultant color.

Reversing the artificial conditions of Newton’s original experiment, Goethe reformulated the problem of color to account for the role of both the observer and his or her context. Alongside the physical issues involved with optics, Goethe thus also realized the aesthetic conditions in the human experience of color. The perceptual capacities of the brain and eye, and their situatedness in a real world of real experience must be considered essential conditions of how colors could be seen. But while his observations of the double color-spectrum are intriguing, Goethe’s physiognomic speculations as to how the subject renders perceptual experience are, even by his contemporary standards, quite amateur. His reification of darkness, moreover, remains difficult to conceptualize coherently, much less to accept.

Although almost entirely ignored in his own time, and even undermined by his once and former collaborator, Schopenhauer, Goethe’s theory did win some later acclaim. His call to recognize the role of the subject in the perception of color does have positive echoes in the neo-Kantian theories of perception of Lange, Helmholtz, and Boscovich. Traces can also be found in twentieth century thinkers as divergent as Wittgenstein and Merleau-Ponty. Despite the fact that almost no serious thinker has ever counted themselves a strict adherent of Goethe’s Farbenlehre, the theory has had a remarkable persistence. Part of the explanation for this may be the obvious superiority of Goethe’s prose; his text is one of very few scientific treatises that can be read by amateurs with pleasure. Part is also due to decline of Newtonian physics generally.

6. Philosophical Influence

Goethe’s general influence on European culture is gargantuan. In 19th century Germany alone, authors like Heine, Novalis, Jean Paul, Tieck, Hoffman, and Eichendorff all owe tremendous debts to Götz and Werther. Thomas Carlyle, Ralph Waldo Emerson, Mark Twain, Kurt Tucholsky, Thomas Mann, James Joyce and too many others to name have since paid tribute to the master from Weimar. Composers like Mozart, Liszt, and Mahler dedicated works to Goethe’s drama, while Beethoven himself mused that the greatest musical accomplishment possible would be a perfect musical expression Faust. Goethe’s ideas have truly launched a thousand ships upon their cultural and intellectual expeditions. Philosophically, the lineage is comparatively more defined.

In his mature years, Goethe was to witness the philosophical focus in Germany shift from Kant to the Idealists. But by the early 1800s, Goethe was too convinced of the worth of his own ideas to be much influenced by what he considered philosophical fashions. Despite his proximity to and considerable influence at the University of Jena, Goethe had little positive contact with Fichte (1762-1814), who arrived there in 1794. Neither Fichte’s Pecksniffian sermonizing nor nearly illegible compositional style would have endeared him personally to the poet. Goethe’s more ambivalent attitude toward Schelling (1775-1854) vacillated between an approval of his appreciation for the deep mysteriousness of nature and an aversion to his futile attempt to solve it by means of an abstracted and artificial system. Schelling’s Naturphilosophie, like Goethe’s morphology, views nature as a constant organic development. But where Goethe saw polarity as an essential part of growth, Schelling understood dualities generally as something to be overcome in the intuition of the ‘absolute’.

Goethe’s relationship with Hegel (1770-1831) was both more direct and more influential. Most overtly, Hegel’s logic draws upon Goethe’s conception of metamorphosis. A letter from Hegel to Goethe on February 20, 1821 reads:

The simple and abstract, what you quite aptly call the archetypal phenomenon, this you put first, and then show the concrete phenomena as arising through the participation of still other influences and circumstances, and you direct the whole process in such a way that the sequence proceeds from the simple determining factors to the composite ones, and, thus arranged, something complex appears in all its clarity through this decomposition. To seek out the archetypal phenomenon, to free it from other extraneous chance surroundings — to grasp it abstractly, as we call it — this I consider to be a task for a great spiritual sense for nature, just as I consider that procedure altogether to be what is truly scientific in gaining knowledge in this field.

For Hegel, famously, a natural object has achieved its greatest perfection when it brings forth its full implicit content in explicit conceptual representation. Because the intellectual world ranks higher than the material, a phenomenology of the whole must observe the gradual unfolding of all possible logical forms from mere sense certainty through the self-recognition of consciousness to absolute knowing. To no small degree, Hegel’s criticism of Kant’s lifeless schematism of the understanding was foreshadowed by Goethe, who wrote, “Reason has to do with becoming, understanding with what has become. The former does not bother with the question, ‘what use?’; the latter does not ask ‘whence?’. Reason takes pleasure in development; understanding wishes to hold everything fixed so that it can exploit it,” (Goethe 1907, 555). Hegel’s formulation of Begriff, which designates the inner plan of the development of an object, was not wholly unlike Goethe’s Urphänomen (see below). The Hegelian dialectic, as an unveiling the movement of the concept would then correspond to the morphology. The problem, for Goethe, was that Hegel’s attempt to articulate wholeness began by the analysis of the logical concept of Being in the Logik and by the sublimation of the sense-certain observation of natural objects in the Phänomenologie, which for Goethe unjustifiably overlooks precisely that which it was the task of science to understand: the development of the natural forms of life, of which the mind is certainly a central one, but indeed only one example. As Goethe writes in a letter to Soret on February 13, 1829, “Nature is always true, always serious, always severe; it is always right, and mistakes and errors are always the work of men.” Similar to his critique of Kant, then, Goethe accused Hegel of creating a grand and abstract system to explain a phenomenon which in both ordinary life and in scientific observation could simply be assumed. Nature presents itself to the epistemologically reflective and to the naïve equally and without preference.

Arthur Schopenhauer’s (1788-1860) mother Johanna became fast friends with Goethe and his lover Christiane Vulpius when she moved to Weimra in 1804. His sister Adele was the lifelong confident of Ottile Pogwisch, who married Goethe’s and Christiane’s son Auguste. But for the young Arthur, due in part to an unavoidable clash of personalities, the established Goethe had little patience. Goethe recognized his intelligence early on, but declined to provide him a letter of recommendation to the university at Göttingen and offered him only a tepid letter of introduction to the classicist Friedrich August Wolf in Berlin. Schopenhauer’s dissertation, however, interested Goethe very much. In the winter of 1813-4, Goethe and Schopenhauer were engaged in extensive philosophical conversation concerning the former’s anti-Newtonian Farbenlehre (see below), out of which grew the latter’s Über das Sehen und die Farben in 1815. When Schopenhauer sent him the manuscript in the hopes of a recommendation, he grew impatient with the elder’s reticence to take his efforts sufficiently seriously. In truth, Schopenhauer’s work largely revealed Goethe’s as a failed attempt to overcome Newtonian visual theory, a fact which wounded Goethe deeply. Goethe followed Schopenhauer’s career with interest, however, and generally praised Die Welt als Wille und Vorstellung. It remains a question, though, whether Goethe ever read the book carefully since scant reference to its ideas can be found.

Like that of his Erzieher Schopenhauer, Nietzsche’s (1844-1900) relationship with Goethe’s thought was deeply ambivalent. Nietzsche often admired Goethe as emblematic of a healthy, fully-formed individual. Goethe is said to be “the last German for whom I feel reverence,” (Nietzsche, Twilight of the Idols, “Skirmishes of an Untimely Man,” section 51). Nietzsche’s early contention that the tragic age of culture began only with the fortuitous interaction of the Apollonian and Dionysian drives bears a similarity to Goethe’s classical understanding of art as a tensional polarity between the blindly creative will and the constraint of formal rules. Yet Nietzsche takes Goethe to task for having invested too much in Winckelmann’s attribution of ‘Heiterkeit’ to classical antiquity and thereby for having ignored its deeply irrational underside. Moreover, Nietzsche’s ontology, if indeed he had one, is like Goethe’s in its rejection of static atomic substances and in its attempt to conceive an intrinsically agonistic process of becoming as the true character of the world. Similar, too, to Goethe’s ‘intensification’ principle, Nietzsche’s notoriously ambiguous ‘Will to Power’ characterizes the dynamic process by which entities ‘become what they are’ by struggling against oppositional limitations that are at the same time the necessary condition for growth. Due to this shared ontological outlook, Goethe and Nietzsche both thought contemporary science was constricted by an outdated conception of substance and, as a result, mechanistic modes of explanation should be reformulated to account for the dynamic character of nature. Despite these commonalities, Nietzsche jettisoned Goethe’s Bildungstrieb for an overarching drive–not to expression or growth within formal constraint—but for overcoming, for power.

Finally, Wittgenstein’s (1889-1951) claim that things which cannot be put into propositional form might nevertheless be shown bears a family resemblance to Goethe’s formulation of the daimonisch. But where Wittgenstein removes the proverbial ladder on which he ascends to his intuitions about the relation between logic and the world, thereby reducing what cannot be bound by the rules of logic as nonsensical, Goethe believed he could communicate what were admittedly ineffable Urphänomene in a non-propositional way, through the feelings evoked by drama. There is, moreover, a distinct similarity in Goethe’s and Wittgenstein’s views on the proper task of philosophy. Its aim, for both, can never be accomplished, once and for all, by means of ‘the right argument’. Argumentation, explanation, and demonstration only go so far in their attempt to unravel the mysteries of the world. “Philosophy simply puts everything before us; it fails to deduce anything,” (Wittgenstein, Philosophical Investigations, 126).

Philosophy’s role in our life should guide us to be reflective people, ever ready to critique inherited dogmas, and always ready to revise our hypotheses in light of new observations. Goethe, through his ceaseless energy, limitless fascination with the world as it was presented to him, and his perpetual willingness to test his convictions against new evidence, carries a timeless appeal to philosophers, not because he demonstrated or explained what it meant to live philosophically, but because, through the example of the course of his life, he showed it.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. German Editions of Goethe’s Works

Akademie-Ausgabe: Werke, edited under the Institut für Deutsche Sprache und Literatur der Deutschen Akademie der Wissenschaften zu Berlin (Berlin: Akademie-Verlag, 1952ff).
Berliner Ausgabe: Poetische Werke. Kunsttheoretische Schriften und Übersetzungen, edited by the Bearbeiter-Kollektiv unter Leitung von Siegfried Seidel et al., 22 Volumes (Berlin/Weimar: Aufbau-Verlag, 1965-78).
Die Schriften zur Naturwissenschaft, edited by Kuhn et al. (Weimar: Deutschen Akademie der Naturforscher, 1947ff).
DTV-Gesamtausgabe: Sämtliche Werke: Nach den Texten der Gedenkausgabe des Artemis-Verlages, edited by Peter Boerner, 45 Volumes (München: Deutscher Taschenbuch Verlag, 1961-63).
Frankfurter Ausgabe: Sämtliche Werke. Briefe, Tagebücher und Gespräche, edited by Dieter Borchmeyer et al., 40 volumes in 2 divisions (Frankfurt a. M.: Deutscher Klassiker Verlag, 1985ff.).
Hamburger Ausgabe: Werke Hamburger Ausgabe in 14 Bänden, edited by Erich Trunz (Hamburg: Chr. Wegner, 1948-60; Reprinted, C. H. Beck, 1981).
Maximen und Reflexionen, edited by Max Hecker (Weimar: Schriften der Goethe Gesellschaft, 1907).
Münchner Ausgabe: Sämtliche Werke nach Epochen seines Schaffens, edited by Karl Richter et al., 20 volumes (München: C. Hanser, 1985-1998).
Weimarer Ausgabe (Sophienausgabe): Goethes Werke, edited under the sponsorship of Großherzogin Sophie von Sachsen, 143 Volumes in 4 divisions (Weimar: H. Böhlau, 1887-1919; Reprinted München: Deutscher Taschenbuch Verlag, 1987).
ii. Letters and Conversations

ii. Letters and Conversations

Eckermann, J.P., Gespräche mit Goethe in den letzten Jahren seines Lebens: 1823-1832, 3 Volumes (Leipzig: Geiger, 1836-1848).
Goethes Briefe: Hamburger Ausgabe, edited by Karl Robert Mandelkow, 4 Volumes (Hamburg, 1962-67 [Post-1972 Publication Site: München: Beck, 1972ff.).
Goethe: Begegnungen und Gespräche, edited by Ernst und Renate Grumach, 14 Volumes (Berlin: De Gruyter, 1965-2011).

iii. English Translations of Goethe’s Works

Conversations of Goethe with Johann Peter Eckermann, translated by John Oxenford (London: J.M. Dent & Sons, 1930).
Theory of Colors, translated by C.L. Eastlake (Boston: MIT Press, 1970).
Truth and Fiction Relating to my Life, translated by John Oxenford (Boston: Simonds & Co., 1902).

b. Selected Secondary Scholarship

i. Historical and Philosophical Context

Bates, A. (ed.), The Drama: Its History, Literature and Influence on Civilization, 20 vols. (London: Historical Publishing Company, 1906).
Borchmeyer, D., Goethe: Der Zeitbürger (München/Wien: Hanser, 1999).
Boyle, N., Goethe: The Poet and the Age (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991).
Breithaupt, F., Jenseits der Bilder: Goethes Politik der Wahrnehmung (Freiburg im Breisgau: Rombach, 2000).
Breithaupt, F., et al. (eds.), Goethe and Wittgenstein: Seeing the World’s Unity in its Variety (Frankfurt a.M.: Peter Lang, 2003).
Bruford, W.H., Culture and Society in Classical Weimar: 1775-1806 (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1962).
Cassirer, E., Goethe und die geschichtliche Welt (Repr. Hamburg: Meiner, 1932).
Hildebrandt, G., Goethes Naturerkenntnis (Hamburg: Stromverlag, 1949).
Heller, E., The Disinherited Mind: Essays in Modern German Literature and Thought (Harmondsworth: Penguin Books, 1952).
Hinderer, W., Goethe und das Zeitalter der Romantik (Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann, 2002).
Hofman, P., Goethes Theologie (Paderborn: Schöningh, 2001).
Lauxtermann, P., Schopenhauer’s Broken World-View: Colours and Ethics between Kant and Goethe (Dordrecht: Kluwer, 2000).
Möckel, C., Anschaulichkeit des Wissens und kulturelle Sinnstiftung: Beiträge aus Lebensphilosophie, Phänomenologie und symbolischem Idealismus zu einer Goetheschen Fragestellung (Berlin: Logos, 2003).
Nicholls, A.J., Goethe’s Concept of the Daemonic: After the Ancients (Rochester, NY: Camden House, 2006).
Reed, T.J., Goethe (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1984).
Richards, R.J., The Romantic Conception of Life: Science and Philosophy in the Age of Goethe (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2002).
Schweitzer, A., Goethe: Four Studies, edited and translated by Charles R. Joy (Boston: Beacon Press, 1949).
Simmel, G., “Goethe und die Jugend,” in Der Tag 395 [6] (August, 1914), translated by Ulrich Teucher and Thomas M. Kemple in Theory, Culture, Society 24 (2007): 85-90.
Stephenson, R.H., Studies in Weimar Classicism: Writing as Symbolic Form (Oxford: Peter Lang, 2010).
Tantillo, A.O., The Will to Create: Goethe’s Philosophy of Nature (Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 2002).
Weier, W., Idee und Wirklichkeit: Philosophie deutscher Dichtung (Paderborn: Schöningh, 2005).

ii. Science and Methodology

Breidbach, O., Goethes Metamorphosenlehre (München: Fink, 2006).
Burwick, F., The Damnation of Newton: Goethe’s Color Theory and Romantic Perception (Berlin, Walter de Gruyter, 1986).
Ciamarra, L.P., Goethe e la storia: studi sulla “Geschichte der Farbenlehre” (Napoli: Liguori, 2001).
Holland, J., German Romanticism and Science: The Procreative Poetics of Goethe, Novalis, and Ritter (New York: Routledge, 2009).
Jardine, N., Scenes of Inquiry: On the Reality of Questions in the Sciences (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2000).
Jürgen, T., Hoffnung und Gefahr (Frankfurt a.M.: Suhrkamp, 2001).
Krätz, O., Goethe und die Naturwissenschaften (München: Callwey, 1992).
Moiso, F., Goethe: La Natura e le sue Forme (Milano: Mimesis, 2002).
Nisbet, H.B., Goethe and the Scientific Tradition (London: Institute of Germanic Studies, 1972).
Nussbaumer, I., Zur Farbenlehre: Entdeckung der unordentlichen Spektren (Wien: Ed. Splitter, 2008).
Richards, R.J., The Tragic Sense of Life: Ernst Haeckel and the Struggle over Evolutionary Thought (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2008).
Seamon, D., & Zajonic, A., Goethe’s Way of Science (Albany: SUNY Press, 1998).
Sepper, D.L., Goethe contra Newton: Polemics and the Project for a New Science of Color (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).
Sherrington, C., Goethe on Nature and Science (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1942).
Steigerwald, J., “Goethe’s Morphology: Ürphänomene and Aesthetic Appraisal,” Journal of the History of Biology 35 (2002): 291-328.
Stephenson, R.H., Goethe’s Conception of Knowledge and Science (Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1995).
Wells, G.A., Goethe and the Development of Science: 1750-1900 (Alphen aan den Rijn: Sijthoff & Noordhoff, 1978).

iii. Aesthetics, Politics, and Theology

Bell, M., The German Tradition of Psychology in Literature and Thought, 1700-1840 (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009).
Dönike, M., Pathos, Ausdruck und Bewegung: zur Ästhetik des Weimarer Klassizismus 1796 – 1806 (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 2005).
Fröschle, H., Goethes Verhältnis zur Romantik (Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann, 2002).
Hibbitt, R., Dilettantism and its Values: from Weimar Classicism to the fin de siècle
(London: Legenda, 2006).
Kuhn, B.H., Autobiography and Natural Science in the Age of Romanticism: Rousseau, Goethe, Thoreau (Farnham/Surrey: Ashgate, 2009).
Oergel, M., Culture and Identity: Historicity in German Literature and Thought 1770 – 1815 (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 2006).

Author Information

Anthony K. Jensen
Email: anthony.jensen@lehman.cuny.edu
City University of New York / Lehman College
U. S. A.

Causal Role Theories of Functional Explanation

Functional explanations are a type of explanation offered in the natural and social sciences. In giving these explanations, researchers appeal to the functions that a structure or system has. For instance, a biologist might say, “The kidney has the function of eliminating waste products from the bloodstream.” Or a sociologist might say, “The purpose of monogamy is to preserve the family structure.” Each of these is concerned with a function that a structure or system is believed to possess. Philosophical interest in this issue concerns understanding what exactly these statements amount to, and whether they are explanatory. Of particular concern is whether such statements commit us to problematic views about the existence of teleology, or purposes, in nature, and whether this is legitimate in the sciences.

This article considers the debate over functional explanations in the philosophical literature from the 1950’s to the early 21^st century. It begins by considering the background to philosophical interest in this subject. Then it looks at two prominent early approaches to functional explanation: Ernest Nagel’s deductive-nomological approach from the 1950’s, and Robert Cummins’ causal account from the 1970’s, as well as objections to both. Throughout there is consideration of illustrative examples of functional explanations from different sciences. Although there are other accounts of functional explanation in the literature, such as the evolutionary and design-oriented accounts, they will be mentioned only in relation to the other two. The broad history of the concept of teleology and the details of the other accounts will not be developed here.

Background
Nagel’s Early Account
Difficulties
Cummins’ View
An Example
Objections and Replies
Other Developments
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Suggested Reading

1. Background

Prior to the 1950’s, philosophers and scientists were concerned with appeals to teleological concepts in the sciences. These concepts have a history going back to Aristotle, who claimed that understanding such things as physical objects or an animal’s physiological structures involves knowing what they are for. In his view, a complete explanation of these structures requires understanding the purposes towards which they are directed. For instance, he thought that one does not understand what a kidney is merely by knowing the material it is made from; one also has to understand that it has the purpose of filtering blood (what it’s for). In Aristotle’s view purposes were conceived as unusual properties like “ends” or “final causes”. But after the scientific revolution these properties were hard to understand in a manner consistent with the sciences, and were considered to be obscure. At a later point this way of thinking was also believed by many to have become questionable because of Darwin’s theory of evolution, which held that talk of Aristotelian purposes was problematic. The idea was to replace talk of such purposes with reference to the notion of natural selection and the environment. The theory of evolution was taken by many scientists to show that appeals to purposive concepts in biology and the social sciences were merely misguided appeals to an outmoded form of explanation. However, the difficulty remained and scientists often continued through the 1900’s to use purposive language in explaining the phenomena that interested them. If appeals to purposive concepts were misguided, then one would have expected these appeals to wither away. So a problem remained in the scientific community over what this situation implied. There was concern about whether this continued talk of purposes was illegitimate in the sciences, or whether there was an acceptable way of understanding such language.

2. Nagel’s Early Account

Modern discussions of functional explanation usually begin with the views developed by Ernest Nagel and others around the 1950’s in the context of scientific explanation (Nagel 1961; Hempel 1959). In his book The Structure of Science, one of Nagel’s concerns was describing the various forms of explanation that occur in the sciences. When we consider the biological and social sciences, he observes, we often find researchers describing the structures or systems that concern them in terms of the functions they have. For instance, a biologist might say, “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system.” Or a sociologist might say, “The purpose of the religious ritual is to increase cohesion in society.” Put generally, Nagel says these statements can be understood as stating that “the function of system X is to do Y.” He claims that there are several issues that such statements raise for further examination. We want to understand the detailed structure of such statements and how they work. We also want to understand how these statements are related to other kinds of explanations offered in the natural and social sciences.

Nagel claims that functional statements can be understood in the following manner. These statements are explanation sketches that when fully spelled out reduce to another form of explanation common in the physical sciences called the Deductive-Nomological model. Nagel’s account focuses on the attributions of functions to the components of a structure (or system). Consider the statement, “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system.” When understood, this statement serves to explain why hearts are present in vertebrates. To see this, we have to note that hearts occur only together with a certain physical organization of the vertebrate body and in a certain external environment that the organism lives in. So, what the statement really says is that, in vertebrate bodies with an organization of blood and blood vessels and in a certain external environment, circulation occurs only if an organism has a heart. If we focus on this latter statement, Nagel says that the information in it can be expanded into a D-N explanation. When this is done, we then have the following explanation: Every vertebrate body with the appropriate organization and in a certain environment engages in circulation. If the vertebrate body does not have a heart, then it does not engage in circulation. Hence, the vertebrate body must have a heart.

This means functional statements in general have the following form for Nagel: The function of A in a system S with organization C is to enable S in environment E to engage in process P. And this can be expanded into an explicit explanation in this way: Every system S with organization C and in environment E engages in process P. If S with organization C and in environment E does not have A, then S does not engage in P. Hence, S with organization C must have A (1961, 403).

Understood this way, functional statements can be seen as explaining why components like hearts are present in certain organisms in which circulation occurs. For what such statements say is that for organisms having a heart is a necessary condition for pumping blood in the circulatory system. Nagel says this means the statement “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system” says the same thing as the statement “Organisms in which circulation occurs pump blood only if they have a heart.” Because of the equivalence, he writes that it appears that “when a function is ascribed to a constituent element in an organism, the content of the teleological [functional] statement is fully conveyed by another statement that is not explicitly teleological and that simply asserts a necessary . . . condition for the occurrence of a certain trait or activity of the organism” (1961, 405).

There are two features of Nagel’s account worth noting at this point. First, he holds that when we attribute a function to a component, this is always relative to a goal state of the larger system. Researchers are not interested in merely any effects of the components a system has. Rather, they are interested in certain effects that are important to the maintenance of the organism. Biologists, for example, are interested in understanding the heart’s pumping blood because this effect contributes to the activity of circulation, which is important for the organism’s survival. It is important to note that for Nagel talk of goals in this context is not intended to make reference to conscious entities of some kind. It only concerns the characteristic activities that researchers believe to be present in the systems that concern them (for example, survival and reproduction).

Second, we saw that functional statements that mention the functions of components can be translated into equivalent statements that lack these notions. Nagel claims this shows there’s nothing scientifically suspect about these statements. We shouldn’t think that such statements commit us to problematic entities like “purposes” in nature that somehow attach to components, or to “ends” or “final causes” towards which components are believed to strive (as in Aristotle’s view of teleology). Instead, what the account makes clear is that, in attributing a function to a component, researchers are merely concerned with explaining why the component is present in the larger system. In light of this, Nagel suggests that functional statements are unproblematic despite their earlier associations in history with unacceptable teleological notions. Understood properly he thinks these statements should be seen as belonging with other legitimate forms of explanation in the sciences (on this point compare Ayala 1970).

3. Difficulties

There are two difficulties commonly noted with the account presented. The first concerns the reference to goals in identifying the effects of the components that are the targets of explanation. As we have seen for Nagel, the function of a component is identified in relation to the effects that contribute towards the important activities of an organism, like survival and reproduction. But this is problematic for some (Cummins 1975) since it suggests there are components that researchers might want to say have functions, but with this account do not. For instance, let us suppose that the wings of a particular species of bird stopped contributing to the capacity for survival and reproduction (maybe this is due to a specific type of airborne predator). In this situation, it seems researchers would not say that the wings did not have any function to perform; they would still want to understand how the wings contributed to the birds’ capacity for flight. The present account would classify these structures as lacking functions when some would say they have functions.

The second problem concerns the sense in which functional statements explain the presence of the components involved. In Nagel’s view, we explain the presence of a component by inferring that it is necessary for the performance of a capacity of a system. In the example considered, the heart is said to be a necessary condition for the occurrence of blood pumping in vertebrates. But it has been held false by some (Wright 1973; Cummins 1975) that having a heart is a necessary condition for pumping blood. For surely there are functionally equivalent structures like artificial hearts that are capable of pumping blood through the circulatory system, or circulation might even be achieved in other ways. If this is the case, however, then functional statements cannot be interpreted as explaining why certain structures must be present in an organism (because they needn’t be). Nagel knew of this concern and said his interest was with actual living systems and what they include (as opposed to logical possibilities). But it is not clear this resolves the worry since we find components like artificial hearts in actual living systems (Buller 1999). Aside from this issue, there are believed to be general problems with the framework of Deductive-Nomological explanation that lies behind Nagel’s account of functional explanation, which have raised concerns with his approach. It is no longer accepted by everyone, for example, that scientific explanations have to be seen as involving deductions from universal, law like statements as required with the Deductive-Nomological model of explanation. The result of this was that people became less inclined to think that an account of functional explanation had to be incorporated into the particular explanatory framework Nagel employed. This was important in making people receptive to the alternative accounts that were being developed.

4. Cummins’ View

After Nagel the most prominent view developed along these lines was by Robert Cummins (1975, 1983). Cummins agrees that the previous account suffers from the problems that were described. The point of functional statements is not to explain why certain components are present in a structure in relation to some goal state the structure has. Instead, Cummins suggests that functional statements are merely used to explain the contributions made by components of a structure to a capacity of a containing system. The performance of a capacity of a system is explained in terms of the capacities of the components it contains, and how they are organized. Consider researchers’ interest in explaining what it is for a system S to have property P. Cummins writes that “the natural strategy for answering such a question is to construct an analysis of S that explains S’s possession of P by appeal to the properties of S’s components and their mode of organization” (1983, 15). For example, let us suppose that researchers are interested in understanding how circulation occurs in vertebrates. To explain this capacity, they search for the structure in the body that contributes to this capacity by moving the blood around. They observe that blood is moved through the arteries by some sort of pumping motion. When they learn that the heart serves as the pumping mechanism in the body, they identify this with its function (they report “the heart has the function of pumping blood”). The capacity for circulation is thus explained in terms of the capacities of the components of the system that enable it to perform the task.

There are different stages that are involved in giving the explanation. Researchers begin with a specification of the larger function of the system they want to explain. The explanation then consists in showing how the function depends on the capacities of the components of the system, and their organization. There are two stages that are involved in this process. The first stage is to analyze the function in question in terms of the capacities involved in bringing about the function, which Cummins calls the analytical strategy. He says “The Analytical Strategy proceeds by analyzing a disposition [function] into a number of other relatively less problematic dispositions such that [the] organized manifestation of these analyzing dispositions amounts to a manifestation of the analyzed disposition” (1977, 272). The second stage is to show that there is a physical structure present that realizes the various capacities. This is needed to show that the function is, in fact, realized by an actual structure or mechanism. As Cummins explains, “Ultimately . . . a complete property theory for a dispositional property must exhibit the details of the target property’s instantiation in the system (or system type) that has it. Analysis of the disposition . . . is only the first step; instantiation is the second” (1983, 31). While the two stages are independent of one another, it is important to note that both stages are needed for the explanation to be complete. This is worth keeping in mind because one sometimes finds discussions in the literature that focus merely on one stage of the explanation and not the other.

Cummins notes that the explanation can be iterated by applying it to the functions of the components cited in the earlier explanation. This process can be repeated until researchers are satisfied with the level reached, or when they reach a level of physical components where no further explanation can be given. In practice, where this line is drawn is relative to the particular interests the researcher has.

Understood this way, functional statements are not used, as Nagel says, in explaining why certain components are present in a system, but to explain how a component contributes to the capacity of the system that contains it. This concern with the causal organization of components is why Cummins’ account is referred to as the “causal role” account of functional explanation. Furthermore, there is no requirement with the account that the larger function being explained be related to the organism’s survival and reproduction (or similar activity). This means the goal state requirement of the previous account has been dropped. In this respect, Cummins’ account can be seen as broadening the number of capacities of systems that are the appropriate subjects of explanation. The broader applicability of the account is seen by many to be a benefit of the view, but we will see later that for some it is thought to raise problems.

5. An Example

With Cummins’ account, the same form of explanation is said to be applicable to a range of different structures or systems in the sciences. The account applies to the functions of structures like the heart in physiology, but it can also be applied to other kinds of systems, including chemical systems, psychological systems, social systems, and others. We can illustrate this with an example from psychology. Consider the explanation of color vision in the human system (Dawson 1998, 163). The function of color vision consists in the capacity (F) to perceive information about the colors of objects in the environment. The trichromatic theory of color vision provides an explanation of how this works. It holds that the function is performed in virtue of the capacities (C_1a, C_2a, . . . C_na) of the components of the visual system (S_1a, S_2a, . . . S_na), and the way they are organized. In particular, the function depends on the capacities of the parts of the eye to produce differential responses to wavelengths of light. Researchers have learned that when light falls on the retina there are three kinds of cone cells there containing photopigments (red, green, and blue) that respond differently to the different wavelengths of light present. These responses are combined together in the retina through cellular connections and produce a distinctive response signal in the nervous system. The signal is sent to the visual cortex in the brain, and leads to the color perceptions we have. In turn, the subcapacities of the individual pigments in the cones (say C_1a) have themselves been explained in terms of the capacities (C_1b, C_2b, . . . C_nb) of the molecular components (S_1b, S_2b, . . . S_nb) of the photopigments and how they respond to light (for example, the capacities of vitamin A and various proteins to change when exposed to light). In this way, the function of color vision has been decomposed into the various capacities of the anatomical components within the eye and nervous system that underlie the function.

In this respect functional explanation is intended to be a general strategy of explanation that can be applied in different sciences. What is needed is for researchers to identify a capacity of the system they want to explain, and then describe how this occurs as a result of the organized behavior of the components which make up the system. In pursuing this strategy, researchers can be seen as undertaking a kind of mechanical analysis in attempting to explain the behaviors of the system that interest them. It is, in part, the broad applicability of the account to different sciences that has made philosophers interested in understanding its details and implications. One will find further illustrations of the account by looking at discussions of functionalism in the philosophy of mind. This will reveal how the account has been used in theories in other areas.

6. Objections and Replies

There are several objections that have been made to the causal role account. Here we will consider four of the common ones. The first is the concern that too many kinds of components can be ascribed functions that on their face don’t seem to have functions. Consider a bit of dirt that has become lodged in a pipe and which operates as a one-way valve (Griffiths 1993). This material can be seen as contributing to the capacity of the pipe to control the flow of liquid, and so can be part of a functional explanation in line with the account. It seems odd to attribute a function to the dirt in this situation, but it becomes a possibility once we have dropped the notion of a goal state from the account. Once this occurs, it seems any effect of a structure that contributes to a capacity can be used in an explanation.

A second objection concerns the various kinds of things that we know objects like hearts are capable of doing. Millikan (1989a) claims that objects like hearts not only move blood through the circulatory system, but also make a thumping noise that doctors can listen to. Making a noise is an effect of the structure that can be explained in terms of the account presented before. But while biologists take the function of the heart to be the circulation of blood, they do not say that making thumping noises is. So the account seems too liberal since it fails to distinguish between genuine functions and mere side effects of the systems.

In reply to these sorts of concerns, Cummins (1975) argues that there is no objective way of making the distinction between genuine functions and other effects. The effects of a component may be relevant to the explanation of different overall capacities. The limits on what capacities should be explained depend on the particular explanatory interests researchers have. Relative to the capacity for blood circulation in the body, the heart can be said to function as a pumping mechanism; but relative to the capacity for making sounds, the heart can be said to function as a noise maker. There is no saying which of these counts as a genuine function in an absolute sense since researchers’ interests are what matter. This response raises issues about the nature of scientific explanations and whether these should be seen as objective, or whether it is sufficient merely to appeal to the interests researchers have. The answer to this depends on what one sees as the appropriate characteristics of a scientific explanation. In addition to making this point, Cummins also added a general restriction on the kinds of explanations that should be given. He said that the appropriateness of a functional explanation is related to the “interestingness” of the explanation being offered. An explanation counts as interesting when the component capacities appealed to in the explanation are less complex and different in kind from the larger capacity being explained. We can illustrate this with the piece of dirt which is lodged in the pipe. For example, the capacity of the dirt to obstruct the flow of liquid is neither less complex nor really different from the overall capacity of the pipe being explained, and so a functional explanation has no interest in this case. This response is intended to place limits on the functional explanations that are appropriate to make in these sorts of cases. But it has been perceived as being somewhat vague in describing the systems to which it applies.

This sort of concern has also been considered by Davies (2001), who argues that there are specific constraints on the effects that are appropriate to use in an explanation. He suggests we can supplement the account offered by recognizing that functions are appropriately attributed, not just to any components, but to those in a hierarchically organized system. A system is hierarchically organized just when the function is performed in virtue of the lower-level organization of the system in question. In this view, the effects of a component are not functional unless they are due to the specific hierarchical organization of the structure. For example, aside from pumping blood the heart beat has the effect of vibrating the sternum in the chest. But this effect does not contribute anything to a larger capacity of the circulatory system, or to other related capacities of the organism. Therefore, there is no reason to accept this as a genuine function of the component in question.

A third problem concerns the character of some of the components to which researchers ascribe functions. Neander (1991; see Millikan 1989b) claims that researchers in sciences like biology commonly refer to components that may be diseased and malformed as having functions. Due to congenital disease, for example, a heart may lack the parts necessary to pump blood around the circulatory system in an organism and thus not work. This presents a problem because here the component will be unable to perform its causal role, and lack the function as a result. Despite this fact, Neander claims that, in this situation, researchers still classify the components functionally as being hearts. She claims this shows we need another notion of function independent of the causal role notion. The evolutionary account she prefers is presently the main rival to the causal role account. It holds that functional explanations are a type of evolutionary explanation. Roughly, to say that a component has a function F is to say that F is an effect of the component that was selected for by natural selection in the past. So the heart has the function of pumping blood because hearts were selected for pumping blood in our ancestors, and this led to the present existence of hearts. With this view the idea is that natural selection confers on components functional roles they are supposed to perform despite their inability to perform their causal role.

Different replies have been offered to this objection. Cummins (1975) accepts that malfunctioning components do not have their causal role functions to perform. If a component is unable to perform its causal role, then this implies the loss of the relevant capacity. A similar sort of view has also been supported by Davies (2001, 176). He maintains that we should not classify components as being malfunctional in these cases. He says that components are wrongly classified this way on the basis of our prior experience of physically similar structures, which leads us to expect the structures will function as the other structures do. But, properly speaking, the structures should be classified as nonfunctional “because natural traits cannot malfunction.” This point is made in relation to a larger complaint he makes that the notion of function appealed to in evolutionary theories does not fit well with the ontologies of the natural sciences.

Another reply has also been offered by Amundson and Lauder (1994). They argue it is false that malfunctioning components can only be classified in terms of the evolutionary functions they perform. They claim that researchers in physiology commonly classify structures in terms of their homologous relationships to other structures, and independently of their functions. Homologies are defined as traits in different species that are similar due to common ancestry (a standard example is the forelimbs of humans and bats that are structurally similar). These traits can be identified in terms of such features as the physical similarity present, correspondence of parts, and other features. These criteria enable researchers to classify structures on the basis of their anatomical features alone. Since researchers can classify a malformed heart as a heart by appeal to its structural features, it is claimed that there is no problem for the account with structures that malfunction. Whether this response is correct depends on how classification works in the practice of researchers in physiology. This has been a subject of early 21st century controversy among philosophers working in this area.

The final problem concerns the role of functional statements in relation to what they explain. As was noted before, on the evolutionary account a functional statement is said to explain the presence of a component of a system. For instance, the statement “the heart functions to pump blood” serves to explain why hearts exist in certain organisms. The idea is that in the past, hearts that pumped blood contributed to the survival of an organism, which explains the present existence of hearts. So, the functional statement points in the direction of an evolutionary account for the rise of the traits which are subject to explanation. In contrast, the causal role account does not provide an explanation in this sense. Functional statements do not serve to explain the presence of the component, but explain the contribution of the component to a capacity of a particular system. This is not a matter of why the component exists in the system, but the task the component performs. The different accounts raise issues about the aims theories of functional explanation are believed to have and what needs explaining. The different perspectives people have taken on this topic are related to how the explanations are used by researchers in different areas of science, and the particular roles the explanations have in these areas.

7. Other Developments

So far, we have seen that the causal role account is applicable to different fields of science. Another issue is discussion over the exact fields it applies to, and how it relates to the other accounts mentioned. In this respect, it will help to describe the relation between the causal role and other accounts as they have been discussed in the biological sciences.

According to Neander (1991), there is a single notion of function used across different areas of biological research. The basic notion is the evolutionary notion we described before that is explained in terms of natural selection. The idea is that the heart functions to pump blood because pumping blood was the effect that hearts were selected for in the past, and which led to the present existence of hearts. Neander claims this is the basic notion at work when researchers appeal to the functions of a component and not the causal notion. In another vein, Kitcher (1993) argues that the concept of design can be seen to underlie all functional explanations. Roughly, to say that a component has a function F is to say that F is what the component was designed to do (the account allows there are different sources of design). He believes the notion applies in evolutionary contexts that involve a past selection process, as well as in physiological investigations that concern the current causal contributions of a component to a system’s capacity (in the latter case, Kitcher claims that a selection process is involved in an indirect way). In both accounts, appeals to functions can be unified under some general concept that applies across different areas of research.

Not everyone agrees, though, that the notion of function can be treated in this way. Godfrey-Smith (1993) argues that it is wrong to think there is a unified concept of function at work in different areas. He suggests there are distinct notions of function that are appropriate to different fields. The causal role notion is appropriate in physiological investigations where researchers are concerned with understanding how the capacities of a system depend on the capacities of its components. These investigations can be undertaken independently from historical considerations about selection. Alternatively, the evolutionary notion is appropriate in areas like evolution and behavioral ecology where researchers are interested in explaining why organisms have the structures and behaviors they have. In this context, the focus is on past selection pressures in the environment, and a historical approach is appropriate. So, in Godfrey-Smith’s view it is a mistake to think that we should be attempting to unify the various uses of functional language under a single account; we should rather accept pluralism. The different notions should merely be seen as reflecting the different kinds of information researchers are concerned with in different areas of investigation. This point can be related to the previous issue concerning the interest-relative character of the explanations researchers offer.

Not only are there concerns about the areas of research where the causal role notion is applicable, but there have been questions raised about similar notions in the vicinity. The causal notion is often thought to be the basic notion at work in physiology (this is controversial for some who hold the evolutionary or other account). Wouters (1995) argues, though, that there is another notion that has been neglected by philosophers in this area. He says that when researchers talk of functional explanations they are often referring to what he calls “viability explanations.” These have a different focus than explaining how a function depends on the capacities of the components of a system. In these cases, researchers are interested in explaining the traits that individuals need to survive and reproduce in their environments. For example, given the distance between the central organs and the outer periphery of the human body, the function of circulating oxygen cannot be performed by simple diffusion. This is why a circulatory system is needed for the performance of the function. This explanation contributes to our understanding by showing why the circulatory system has to be present for maintaining the viability of the organism. Wouters claims that this form of explanation is distinct from the previous accounts we described, and involves its own explanatory structure. Moreover, this explanation is said to share features with the earlier notion of functional explanation described by those like Nagel. In this respect, it is suggested that philosophers may have overlooked an important notion of functional explanation worthy of further examination.

There is a lot more that could be said about the subject of causal role functional explanation, and the debate about functions. We have not covered everything that might be considered on this issue. One thing that is clear from our discussion, though, is that a proper understanding of functional explanations cannot be achieved independently from considering how they are used in the sciences. Whether, and to what extent, the causal role notion is applicable in a particular area needs to be determined by examining the science in question. In this respect, those interested in furthering our understanding of the notion will have to familiarize themselves with the details of the examples being considered. An understanding of how functional explanations are used is an important part of helping us improve our understanding of this concept.

8. References and Further Reading

a. References

Amundson, R., & Lauder, G. (1994). “Function without purpose: the uses of causal role function in evolutionary biology.” Biology and Philosophy 9: 443-469.
Ariew, A., Cummins, R., & Perlman, M. (eds.) (2002). Functions: New Essays in the Philosophy of Psychology and Biology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Ayala, F. (1970). “Teleological explanations in evolutionary biology.” Philosophy of Science 37: 1-15.
Block, N. (1980). “Introduction: what is functionalism?” In Block, N. (ed.) Readings in Philosophy of Psychology, vol. 1. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Cummins, R. (1977). “Programs in the explanation of behavior.” Philosophy of Science 44: 269-287.
Cummins, R. (1983). The Nature of Psychological Explanation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Davies, P. (2001). Norms of Nature: Naturalism and the Nature of Functions. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Dawson, M. (1998). Understanding Cognitive Science. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
Enç, B. & Adams, F. (1992). “Functions and goal directedness.” Philosophy of Science 59: 635-654.
Godfrey-Smith, P. (1993). “Functions: consensus without unity.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 74: 196-208.
Griffiths, P. E. (1993). “Functional analysis and proper functions.” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 44: 409-422.
Hempel, C. G. (1959). “The logic of functional analysis.” In Gross, L. (ed.) Symposium on Sociological Theory. Evanston, IL: Harper and Row Publishers.
Hempel, C. G. & Oppenheim, P. (1948). “Studies in the logic of explanation.” Philosophy of Science 15: 135-175.
Kitcher, P. (1993). “Function and design.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 18: 379-397.
McLaughlin, P. (2001). What Functions Explain: Functional Explanation and Self-Reproducing Systems. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Millikan, R. G. (1989a). “An ambiguity in the notion of function.” Biology and Philosophy 4: 172-176.
Millikan, R. G. (1989b). “In defense of proper functions.” Philosophy of Science 56: 288- 302.
Nagel, E. (1961). The Structure of Science. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett.
Nagel, E. (1977). “Teleology revisited: goal-directed processes in biology.” Journal of Philosophy 74: 261-301.
Neander, K. (1991). “The teleological notion of ‘function’.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 69 (4): 454-468.
Neander, K. (2002). “Types of traits: the importance of functional homologies.” In Ariew, A., Cummins, R., & Perlman, M. (eds.) (2002).
Polger, T. (2004). Natural Minds. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Wouters, A. (1995). “Viability explanation.” Biology and Philosophy 10: 435-457.
Wright, L. (1973). “Functions.” Philosophical Review 82: 139-168.

b. Suggested Reading

Allen, C., Bekoff, M., & Lauder, G. (eds.) (1998). Nature’s Purposes: Analyses of Function and Design in Biology. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Buller, D. (ed.) (1999). Function, Selection, and Design. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
Cummins, R. (1975). “Functional Analysis.” Journal of Philosophy 72: 741-765. Reprinted with minor alterations in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998) and Buller (1999).
Wouters, A. (2005). “The function debate in philosophy.” Acta Biotheoretica 53: 123-151.

Author Information

Mark B. Couch
Email: mark.couch@shu.edu
Seton Hall University
U. S. A.

The Third Earl of Shaftesbury (1671—1713)

Anthony Ashley Cooper, the Third Earl of Shaftesbury (1671-1713) was an English philosopher who profoundly influenced 18^th century thought in Britain, France, and Germany. As a part of an important social circle of English Freethinkers along with early deists such as John Toland, Matthew Tindal, and Anthony Collins, Shaftesbury’s work had a significant influence on French deists such as Voltaire and Rousseau. He also corresponded with some of the most important thinkers of his day, including Locke, Leibniz, and Bayle. Shaftesbury was most influential in the history of English language philosophy through his concept of the moral sense which heavily influenced Hutcheson, Butler, Hume, and Adam Smith; and Shaftesbury was influential in Germany through his concept of enthusiasm which recovered (intuitive) reason from mere (discursive) reasoning and influenced the Romantic idea of the creative imagination as found in German thinkers such as Lessing, Mendelssohn, Goethe, Herder, and Schiller.

Although Shaftesbury was enormously influential in the 18^th century, his prestige declined in the 20^th century, primarily due to the rise of analytic philosophy which defined philosophy such that Shaftesbury’s work seemed more like literature or rhetoric than proper philosophy. Those trained in analytic philosophy continue to have trouble reading Shaftesbury, largely because he self-consciously rejects systematic philosophy and focuses more on rhetoric and literary persuasion than providing numbered premises. Shaftesbury is interested as much in moral formation as he is in moral theorizing, though his work does contain some, albeit intentionally veiled, discussion of theoretical concerns.

As Shaftesbury saw it, Hobbes had set the agenda of British moral philosophy (a search for the grounding of universal moral principles), and Locke had established its method (empiricism). Shaftesbury’s important contribution was to focus that agenda by showing what a satisfactory response to Hobbes might look like but without giving up too much of Locke’s method. Shaftesbury showed the British moralists that if we think of moral goodness as analogous to beauty, then (even within a broadly empiricist framework) it is still possible for moral goodness to be non-arbitrarily grounded in objective features of the world and for the moral agent to be attracted to virtue for its own sake, not merely out of self-interest.

In his most influential works, Shaftesbury thinks of moral judgment as self-reflection. First we have motives, and then we reflect on those motives resulting in a feeling of moral approval or condemnation. The process is the same when evaluating other agents: we reflect on their motives and feel approval or condemnation. In Shaftesbury’s aesthetic language, the state of having the morally correct motives is the state of being “morally beautiful,” and the state of approving the morally correct motives upon reflection is the state of having “good moral taste.” Shaftesbury argues that the morally correct motives which constitute moral beauty turn out to be those motives which are aimed at the good of one’s society as a whole. This good is understood teleologically. Furthermore Shaftesbury argues that both the ability to know the good of one’s society and the reflective approval of the motivation toward this good are innate capacities which must nevertheless be developed by proper socialization.

Life
Works
Aims and Methods
Major Themes
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Texts
2. Secondary Texts

1. Life

Shaftesbury was part of an important political family. Shaftesbury’s grandfather, the First Earl of Shaftesbury (1621-1683), was an influential and controversial Whig politician. The Whigs were the party in favor of the supremacy of parliament over the monarchy in England. The opposing party, the Tories, supported the monarchy and also tended to support a hierarchical state-sponsored religion, either Anglicanism or Roman Catholicism. The Whigs favored freedom of religion, supporting religious “Dissenters,” at first Puritans, Calvinists, Quakers, etc., and later Deists. In 1679 the First Earl of Shaftesbury introduced a bill into Parliament attempting to exclude King Charles II’s brother James (later King James II) from the throne because James was Roman Catholic. The bill failed, and the First Earl was eventually charged with treason and fled to Holland where he died in exile.

Shaftesbury was very close to his grandfather and revered the memory of the First Earl. Because Shaftesbury’s father had an unidentified degenerative illness, Shaftesbury was raised in the household of the First Earl from the age of four. After the First Earl’s disgrace, Shaftesbury made it one of his life’s goals to rehabilitate his family’s reputation. Though his votes in Parliament occasionally sided with the Tories, Shaftesbury always stayed true to the political principles of his grandfather, consistently fighting for religious tolerance and a balance of powers at both the national and international level (see Voitle, p. 73; cf. p. 414).

John Locke (1632-1704) was a close friend of the First Earl and an advisor to the family for years to come after the First Earl’s death. Locke was the personal physician and general advisor to the First Earl. He supervised the childhood medical care of Shaftesbury’s father, the Second Earl (1652-1699). He also helped find a wife for the Second Earl and he cared for her during her pregnancy with the Third Earl. Most significantly for our purposes, Locke supervised the Third Earl’s education. He personally chose Shaftesbury’s governess Elizabeth Birch and designed a curriculum for her to follow in her instruction of the child. This experience was, presumably, the basis for Locke’s later work Thoughts Concerning Education. Under Birch’s tutelage, Shaftesbury received a strong education in the Classics and became fluent in Greek and Latin by the age of eleven. Locke continued to check on Shaftesbury’s progress over the years. After the First Earl’s death when Shaftesbury was twelve years old, he attended Winchester College, a secondary school which at the time was dominated by Tory sentiment. Shaftesbury felt persecuted by his peers on account of the First Earl’s political reputation.

In 1687, at the age of 16, Shaftesbury began his two-year “Grand Tour” of Europe, a customary part of a British nobleman’s education during the period. After an extended stay in Paris, Shaftesbury spent most of his tour in Italy where, based on his diary, he focused his attention on art and architecture. He was especially interested in ruins from the classical Roman period. The first stop on his tour, however, was Holland where Shaftesbury spent several months visiting John Locke.

After returning from his Grand Tour in 1689, Shaftesbury took over managing much of the family estates and interests from his bedridden father. Shaftesbury also had to supervise the education of his brothers and the marriages of his sisters; oversee the family finances and investments; govern the family lands, a job which included adjudicating disputes among the tenants; and, in 1695, take his place as a member of Parliament in the House of Commons. Locke served as a primary advisor to the young Shaftesbury as he found his footing in these new duties, though Shaftesbury did not always follow Locke’s advice. Shaftesbury had many philosophical conversations with Locke, some of which are preserved in correspondence. During this time, Shaftesbury wrote his first philosophical works, An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit and the “Preface” to his edition of Whichcote’s sermons.

The smoky, polluted air of London did not agree with Shaftesbury, and he developed what would become a life-long and eventually fatal respiratory disease. Shaftesbury was diagnosed with a form of asthma, though Voitle suggests that the evidence points toward tuberculosis (Voitle, p. 226). In 1698, due to his health, he retired from public life and spent a year in Holland where he met important thinkers of the day including Pierre Bayle (1647-1706), who became a close friend, despite their philosophical disagreements.

While in retirement he also began keeping his philosophical journal, which he labeled Askemata (Greek: exercises), posthumously published under the title of Philosophical Regimen. The Askemata reveals Shaftesbury as a disciple of the ancient Stoics, especially Epictetus and Marcus Aurelius.

After the death of his father, Shaftesbury inherited the title of Earl and felt obligated to return to Parliament in 1700 (this time in the House of Lords). Yet his health continued to worsen, and he gradually spent more and more time in retirement, during which time he prepared his philosophical works for publication. By the time his collected works appeared in 1711 as Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, Shaftesbury’s health was so poor he decided to move to Italy in search of a more hospitable climate. There he continued to write. He prepared a revised second edition of the Characteristics, reading the work aloud to see how it sounded and making changes mostly in style and grammar. He also added important illustrations, an allegorical headpiece for each treatise. Finally, he began a sequel to the Characteristics to be titled Second Characters. The warm, sulphurous air off the Bay of Naples did help Shaftesbury’s health, but not enough. He died in 1714 without finishing his work.

2. Works

Shaftesbury’s first publication was a collection of sermons written by Cambridge Platonist Benjamin Whichcote. His introduction to that volume praised Whichcote for maintaining the goodness of human nature and the existence of a natural impulse toward benevolence. This was in contrast to most other 17^th century divines who followed secular thinkers in holding that self-interest is the only motive to action and were therefore required to ground moral motivation in the rewards and punishments of the afterlife.

Shaftesbury’s major work Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times (first edition published 1711) is an anthology of five previously published essays, sometimes with substantial revisions: An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit (1699); A Letter Concerning Enthusiasm (1708); Sensus Communis, An Essay on the Freedom of Wit and Humor (1709); The Moralists, A Philosophical Rhapsody (1709); and Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author (1710). Along with these earlier works, Shaftesbury appended five new chapters of Miscellaneous Reflections roughly corresponding to the five essays which attempt to bring some coherence to the collection by commenting on and qualifying Shaftesbury’s earlier views.

His other published philosophical works include A Notion of the Historical Draught or Tablature of the Judgment Hercules and A Letter Concerning Design, originally a set of instructions for a painting Shaftesbury had commissioned and a letter commenting on those instructions, both written in 1712. Shaftesbury planned to include these works in a projected sequel to the Characteristics called Second Characters, but he died before the project could be completed. The Notion was subsequently included in the posthumous 1714 edition of the Characteristics, while the Letter Concerning Design was also added in the 1732 edition. These two late works were included, along with some of Shaftesbury’s unfinished works (including a dialogue called The Picture of Cebes and a treatise to be entitled Plastics, an Epistolary Excursion in the Original Progress and Power of Designatory Art), in Benjamin Rand’s attempted reconstruction of Second Characters, published in 1914.

Finally, we have some of Shaftesbury’s correspondence and private journals (the Askemata), albeit in an unreliable transcription reordered and edited by Rand, published in 1900 under the title The Life, Unpublished Letters, and Philosophical Regimen of Anthony, Earl of Shaftesbury.

3. Aims and Methods

Shaftesbury is primarily known in the history of philosophy for two things. To moral philosophers he is known as the father of moral sense theory in British moralism; and to philosophers of art, he is known as “the first great aesthetician that England produced” (Cassirer 1953, 166) whose work was seminal for the German Romantics. But neither of these is what Shaftesbury himself thought was most important about his work. Shaftesbury was not simply working out an epistemology of ethics or an account of aesthetic experience. He did examine both of these issues, but his more direct interest was in transforming British moral inquiry by synthesizing ethics and aesthetics.

To use Shaftesbury’s own terms, the chief aim of his work is to introduce the concepts of “moral beauty” and “moral taste” to eighteenth century British society. In the final chapter of the Characteristics Shaftesbury sums up his overall project: “It has been the main scope and principal end of these volumes to assert the reality of a beauty and charm in moral as well as natural subjects, and to demonstrate the reasonableness of a proportionate taste and determinate choice in life and manners” (Miscellaneous Reflections V.iii, 466). Earlier he claims he is “intent chiefly on this single point, to discover how we may to best advantage form within ourselves what in the polite world is called a relish or good taste” (Miscellaneous Reflections III.i, 404). Therefore Shaftesbury’s goal is to show that not every preference is equally appropriate to human nature and that there is such a thing as “good taste” in art and morality.

Shaftesbury’s writing style is intrinsically related to his philosophical goals. Since Shaftesbury’s major audience was genteel or “polite” society, he often writes in a playfully oblique and ironic rhetorical style. He uses elaborate analogies and metaphors to entertain and disarm his readers but not necessarily to carry any great philosophical weight (the most significant and easily misunderstood being the famous analogy of moral judgment with sensation). Therefore modern readers must always keep in mind the looseness and lack of analytic rigor with which Shaftesbury approaches his material. He is trying to provide powerful suggestions aimed at forming his readers’ moral sentiments rather than to give detailed arguments to establish a theoretical system. In other words, Shaftesbury wants to help his readers actually develop good moral taste, not merely to theorize about it.

4. Major Themes

a. Moral Realism

Shaftesbury did not see himself as inventing a new synthesis of aesthetics and ethics. Rather, he thought he was protecting a classical synthesis. And Shaftesbury thought the primary threat to the classical notions of moral beauty and moral taste came from the empiricist philosophy of Hobbes and Locke.

The four elements of Hobbes’s view to which Shaftesbury objected were empiricism, mechanism, voluntarism, and egoism. Empiricism rejected innate ideas of morality. Instead, moral principles were understood as a result of subjective emotions whereas classical moral philosophy saw moral principles as deriving from the human being’s objective teleology. The modern mechanistic physics, however, rejected natural teleology. If there was to be a set of universal moral principles, it could not be grounded on universal human nature, but it must be, as voluntarism asserts, grounded on a sovereign will (either God’s or the human government’s) expressed in positive law.

Shaftesbury believed Hobbes had reduced morality to self-interest, and it is to this Hobbesian “skepticism” that Shaftesbury is responding. But Shaftesbury also had another, more personal target. As a child Shaftesbury had been tutored by John Locke, a personal advisor of his grandfather. But as Shaftesbury grew up, he came to reject the moral skepticism he thought followed from Locke’s empiricism and voluntaristic divine command theory. According to Shaftesbury, many of those who rejected Hobbes’s political philosophy, including the “free writers” (read: deists) and Locke, nevertheless went “in the self-same tract” as Hobbes’s philosophy. Shaftesbury goes on to argue that Locke was in fact more dangerous than Hobbes or the Deists because, unlike them, Locke had the reputation of “sincerity as a most zealous ‘Christian’ and believer” and was thus able to make the nominalist position attractive to a wide audience. And it was Locke who had succeeded in convincing many of the British moralists to give up the idea of goodness as natural rather than as socially constructed.

It was Mr. Locke that struck the home blow: for Mr. Hobbes’s character and base slavish principles in government took off the poison of his philosophy. ’Twas Mr. Locke that struck at all fundamentals, threw all order and virtue out of the world, and made the very ideas of these (which are the same as those of God) “unnatural,” and without foundation in our minds. (Rand 1900, p. 403)

Hence it was against Locke that Shaftesbury thought morality most needed to be defended.

What bothered Shaftesbury and many of his contemporaries about Hobbes and Locke were the empiricists’ apparent rejection of the “reality” of virtue. In his dialogue The Moralists, Shaftesbury has the character Philocles distinguish two ways modern religious philosophers defended the link between religion and morality: “Some of them hold zealously for virtue, and are realists in the point. Others, one may say, are only nominal moralists by making virtue nothing in itself, a creature of will only or a mere name of fashion” (The Moralists, II.2, p. 262, my emphasis). Later in the dialogue, the character Theocles says that the author of “a certain fair Inquiry” (i.e., Shaftesbury’s own Inquiry Concerning Virtue and Merit) argued against a specifically religious basis for ethics:

For being, in respect of virtue, what you lately called a realist, he endeavours to show that it is really something in itself and in the nature of things, not arbitrary or factitious (if I may so speak), not constituted from without or dependent on custom, fancy or will, not even on the supreme will itself, which can no way govern it but, being necessarily good, is governed by it and ever uniform with it. (The Moralists, II.3, p. 266-7)

Here a “realist” about virtue is someone who holds the view that morality is “in the nature of things.” On this scheme, then, moral realism is opposed not only to relativism (the view that morality is constituted by “custom”) and subjectivism (the view that morality is constituted by an individual’s “fancy”) but also to voluntarism (the view that morality is constituted by the “will” of a sovereign, whether Locke’s God or Hobbes’s Leviathan). So, according to Shaftesbury, to give morality a subjective basis in individual self-interest (even if one then attempted to construct on this subjective basis a set of objective and universal moral laws), rather than an objective basis in some intrinsic feature of character or action, is to deny the reality of moral distinctions, a position synonymous in the early modern mind with moral skepticism. Conversely, to call morality “real” was to commit oneself to what Shaftesbury’s predecessor Ralph Cudworth called “eternal and immutable” principles of morality.

b. Moral Beauty

Throughout the Characteristics, Shaftesbury argues that moral beauty is a “beauty of the sentiments, the grace of actions, the turn of characters, and the proportions of a human mind” (Sensus Communis IV.ii, p. 62). In general, for Shaftesbury, beauty is a matter of harmonious proportion or “numbers.” The “beauties of the human soul,” then, are “the harmony and numbers of an inward kind” (Sensus Communis IV.ii, p. 63). They are an “inward anatomy” of soul which, like the outward anatomy of the body, must be brought into the “order or symmetry” that is constitutive of beauty and health (Inquiry 2.I.ii, p. 194).

For Shaftesbury, the concept of moral beauty is not merely a metaphorical comparison between ethics and aesthetics. Rather beauty and goodness are “one and the same” (The Moralists III.ii, p. 320) such that moral or mental beauty turns out to be more fundamental than physical beauty. Beauty, Shaftesbury argues, is primarily a property of souls or minds, not of bodies at all: “the beautifying not the beautified, is the really beautiful” (Moralists III.ii, p. 322). When we judge a body to be beautiful we are really judging the act of designing and creating the body to be beautiful. Shaftesbury argues for this conclusion by pointing out that when we say a statue is beautiful, we aren’t admiring the “matter” (the marble or bronze or whatever) but the “art and design” which Shaftesbury calls “the form or forming power.”

Yet terms like “design” and “form” can be either nouns or verbs. That is, we can speak either of the form of an object or the act of forming the object. Shaftesbury concludes, “Here therefore is double beauty. For here is both the form, the effect of mind, and mind itself.” (Moralists III.ii, p. 323) He calls the passive objects “dead forms … which bear a fashion and are formed, whether by man or nature, but have no forming power, no action or intelligence,” and he calls the active subjects variously “living forms,” “forming forms,” or “the forms which form, that is, which have intelligence, action and operation.”

Thus Shaftesbury distinguishes two distinct “degrees or orders of beauty” before going on to argue for a third order of beauty “which forms not only such as we call mere forms but even the forms which form” (Moralists III.ii, p. 323-4). Hence we have these three orders of beauty: first the dead forms, second the forming forms, and third the “supreme and sovereign beauty.” If the first order of beauty is the form of the object in the sense of the object’s design, then the second order of beauty is the active mental subject capable of creating this sort of intelligent design. In other words, the second order of beauty is the human mind itself which, through its intelligent creativity, imposes ordered design on the matter. But, while the mind is a forming power which gives form to the body, at the same time the mind has its own form which is given to it by its participation in the divine Mind, “the principle, source, and fountain of all beauty” (Moralists III.ii, p. 324). Thus the three forms or orders of beauty seem to be natural beauty, moral beauty, and the beauty of God.

Following ancient Stoicism, Shaftesbury thinks of the world as a unified organism infused by the immanent living “soul” or “mind” of God without which even the natural world would be dead and hence could not be beautiful. God (“the universal and sovereign Genius”) is a “uniting principle” which makes individual parts of nature into a system, a living organism directed to a teleological end (Moralists III.i, p. 301). Nature, then, is not simply a “mere body, a mass of modified matter,” but is a rationally structured “whole” which constitutes a “self” or mind whose body is the world (Moralists III.i, p. 302-3).

The teleological element of this view is emphasized when Shaftesbury describes his vision of an ever-widening system of interconnectedness. Shaftesbury starts with the concept of an ordered system: “Whatever things have order, the same have unity of design and concur in one, are parts constituent of one whole or are, in themselves, entire systems” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 274). In other words, the concept of order is teleological: a system has order insofar as its parts are aimed at a single end. Organisms and artifacts are examples of this sort of system: “Such is a tree with all its branches, an animal with all its members, and edifice with all its exterior and interior ornaments” (ibid.). Just as the parts of a human artifact, such as a piece of architecture, are designed so as to form a unified whole, the parts of a plant or animal are also interconnected in such a way as to form a complete system. Thus something forms a system if its parts are not “independent but all apparently united … according to one simple, consistent and uniform design” (ibid.). For example, this sort of “mutual dependency of things” can be seen “in any dissected animal, plant or flower where [even] he who is no anatomist nor versed in natural history sees that the many parts have a relation to the whole, for thus much even a slight view affords” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 275).

But individual organisms are only relatively self-sufficient. Their parts are internally united, but at the same time organisms are externally united to other organisms. As Shaftesbury puts it in the Inquiry:

If therefore, in the structure of this or any other animal, there be anything which points beyond himself and by which he is plainly discovered to have relation to some other being or nature besides his own, then will this animal undoubtedly be esteemed a part of some other system. (Inquiry I.ii.2, p. 168).

So, for example, human organisms, especially as infants, are “helpless, weak, and infirm” and are thus inherently (“purposely, and not by accident”) “rational and sociable” such that humanity “can no otherwise increase or subsist than in that social intercourse and community which is his natural state” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 283). Likewise the human species is dependent on other species of plants and animals for their survival just as, for example, “to the existence of the spider that of the fly is absolutely necessary,” showing that each individual species is “in general, a part only of some other system,” namely “the system of all animals” (Inquiry I.ii.2, p. 168).

Thus human organisms form a system called a community. Likewise, all human communities form the human species (“the system of his kind”), which fits into a certain ecosystem of the planet Earth, which has its ordered place in the universe as a whole. Thus Shaftesbury concludes, “all things in this world are united” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 274).

For Shaftesbury, this cosmic order has moral implications. If man is an ordered system of parts, then “there must be somewhere a last or ultimate end in man” (Regimen, p. 48). Because human beings have instinctive “dispositions of mind such as plainly refer to a species and society, and to the enjoyment of converse, mutual alliance, and friendship, then is the end of man society” (Regimen, p. 48-9; cf. the similar argument at Inquiry II.i, p. 167).

The virtues (things such as “integrity, justice, faith” etc.) are those character traits which allow us to live in society with other humans thereby fulfilling our “end.” Therefore the virtues are “part of a man, as he is a man” (Regimen, p. 50) – they allow us to be fully human and to “live according to nature” (Regimen p. 52).

In this way, the natural order grounds the normativity of individual moral beauty. Following classical Platonic and Stoic sources Shaftesbury holds that everything else is beautiful to the degree that it works in harmony with the supreme beauty of providential design (The Moralists II.iii, p. 277). Thus there is a “nature upon which the world depends, and … every genius else must be subordinate to that one good genius” (Moralists III.i, p. 300).

While the supreme beauty can serve as a standard to ground the particular choices of particular minds, it is not a subjectively chosen standard. It is the objective ordering of the universe. For Shaftesbury beauty in general is a proper ordering between the parts of something according to the universal natural rules of harmony and proportion. Therefore a viewer’s subjective failure to judge the proper objective value of this ordering does not diminish its value. This value is a “symmetry and proportion founded still in nature” (Soliloquy III.iii, p. 157-8). And when “we are reconciled to the goodly order of the universe” by developing beautiful souls “we harmonize with nature and live in friendship with God and man” (Moralists III.iii, p. 334). It is this harmonious relationship to the natural order that Shaftesbury calls moral beauty.

In summary, beauty, whether of a body or a soul, is grounded in an objective standard of order – namely the mind of God as expressed in the natural order. At the highest level this order is the “supreme beauty” of God which guides God’s own creation of the natural order and which we in turn imitate when we bring order to our bodies, souls, or artworks.

c. Moral Sense

In his essay Sensus Communis, Shaftesbury argues for an understanding of “common sense” as a sense of the common good (Sensus Communis III.1-2, 48-53). Shaftesbury finds a predecessor in the Roman tradition which followed Marcus Aurelius’s coining of the term koinonoemosune to describe the same sort of sense of the common good (Sensus Communis III.1, 48n19). This notion of the common good recalls the distinction between one’s “private good” and one’s “real good” which Shaftesbury draws in his essay An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit. The private good or “self-interest” is the “end” or “interest” which is “right” for an individual of one’s species and toward which the natural affections point when they are not “ill.” And the real good or “virtue” is the end in which one’s private good harmonizes with the common good of one’s species as a whole (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 167). Note that pursuing one’s private good is not necessarily selfish. In fact, for Shaftesbury, pursuing one’s private good is necessary, natural, and therefore good (insofar as it does not conflict with the public good). “Selfishness” is not just any regard for one’s private good, but an “immoderate” one which is “inconsistent with the interest of the species or public” (Inquiry I.II.2, p. 170).

Shaftesbury emphasizes the importance of one’s relation to society when he says that a creature is “nowise” good (that is, neither “privately” nor “really” good) if it is naturally part of a “system” but is either detached from the system or harms that system (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 168). Recall, as discussed above, that a human’s most immediate “system” is society. In this way the sensus communis becomes a necessary component in Shaftesbury’s ethics. On Shaftesbury’s view, for any action to be considered good, the agent must be moved to action by an affection for the good of the system: one can only be “supposed good when the good or ill of the system to which he has relation is the immediate object of some passion or affection moving him” (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 169). According to Shaftesbury, then, we could not have an affection toward the common good if we didn’t somehow represent the common good to ourselves. And it is the sensus communis which allows us to do that. Shaftesbury is clear that it is not enough that our actions be in fact aimed at the common good though still inwardly motivated by self-interest: “as soon as he has come to have any affection towards what is morally good and can like or affect such good for its own sake, as good and amiable in itself, then is he in some degree good and virtuous, and not till then” (Inquiry I.iii.3, p. 188). To be virtuous, an action must be aimed at the common good because we recognize that it is the common good and have an affection toward it as such. Thus a truly virtuous and good creature is “one as by the natural temper or bent of his affections is carried primarily and immediately, and not secondarily and accidentally, to good and against ill” (Inquiry I.ii.2, 171). Shaftesbury thinks this affection toward the good of one’s species is natural and common to every member of the species. Thus a virtuous action “ought by right” to have as its “real motive” the natural affection for one’s species.

Being motivated by an affection toward the common good is, however, only a necessary, not a sufficient, condition for being virtuous. While anything can be good under Shaftesbury’s definition, only a human being can be virtuous. This is because virtue requires a “reflected sense” (that is, the ability to reflect on what is good and right) which requires a high degree of reason. Shaftesbury says:

But to proceed from what is esteemed mere goodness and lies within the reach and capacity of all sensible creatures, to that which is called virtue or merit and is allowed to man only: In a creature capable of forming general notions of things, not only the outward beings which offer themselves to the sense are the objects of affection, but the very actions themselves and the affections of pity, kindness, gratitude and their contraries, being brought into the mind by reflection, become objects. So that, by means of this reflected sense, there arises another kind of affection towards those very affections themselves, which have been already felt and have now become the subject of a new liking or dislike. (Inquiry I.ii.3, p. 172)

The view seems to be that the sensus communis shows us what is good for our species and we naturally “approve” of that good and have an “affection” towards it, thereby motivating us to act. Those actions are individually good which are motivated by an affection toward the good of the whole. Then our “reflected sense” gives us a “new affection” towards the motives which result in good actions. On the next page Shaftesbury refers to this “reflected sense” as a “sense of right and wrong” which he defines as “a sentiment or judgment of what is done through just, equal and good affection or the contrary” (Inquiry I.ii.3, p. 173). The notion of the moral sentiments, as Shaftesbury employs it, presupposes the existence of the sensus communis. A properly functioning person is already motivated by the right affections as represented by the sensus communis, and then our moral sentiment (our “sense of right and wrong”) confirms that those are in fact the right motivations by giving us a higher-order “feeling,” “affection,” or “sentiment” of which actions are done by the right affections. In other words, moral sentiment is a second-order affection toward the “right” first-order affections. Note that, while Shaftesbury also talks as if not only first-order affections but also actions, tempers, etc., can be the objects of the moral affection, it must be remembered that for Shaftesbury no action or temper is truly good or virtuous unless it is motivated by affection for the common good. In sum, after the sensus communis determines the moral action and motivates us to pursue it as good, then moral sentiment approves of what the common sense tells us via a feeling of affection and thereby motivates us to pursue it as virtuous.

It is important to notice here that, while Shaftesbury refers to our moral sentiments as our “conscience” and even as our “sense of right and wrong,” he is not trying to establish a “moral sense” as a distinct mental “faculty” for receiving moral ideas. As D.D. Raphael notes, “the casual application of the word ‘sense’ to the moral faculty is hardly more significant in Shaftesbury than it is in Samuel Clarke, who was a severe rationalist” (The Moral Sense, p. 16). We talk of a “sense of purpose,” a “sense of urgency,” a “sense of adventure,” a “sense of humor,” etc. Sometimes we even speak of morally relevant “senses” such as a “sense of decency,” a “sense of shame,” a “sense of duty,” etc. But we don’t mean to suggest that any of these “senses” ought to be thought of as analogous to the physical senses or that they are special mental faculties metaphysically distinct from our ordinary mental faculties. Likewise, Shaftesbury’s use of the phrase “sense of right and wrong” is simply a figure of speech. He thought we used our ordinary faculties of thinking, feeling, and desiring to make moral judgments.

Shaftesbury sometimes seems to suggest that moral judgment is instinctive, yet this is not his considered view. For example, in the dialogue titled The Moralists, A Philosophical Rhapsody, Shaftesbury seems to advance the claim that our sense of beauty is innate: “Nothing surely is more strongly imprinted on our minds or more closely interwoven with our souls than the idea or sense of order and proportion” (The Moralists II.4, p. 273-4). In this context, Shaftesbury is specifically talking about natural beauty, but, as we have seen above, moral beauty is a function of one’s relationship to the natural order. Shaftesbury notes that we can easily tell the difference between a structure created by an architect and a mere “heap of sand and stones” and claims that “this difference is immediately perceived by a plain internal sensation.” The source of this sensation seems to be the common sense. In the Sensus Communis essay, Shaftesbury argues that true beauty in art requires the artist to submit the “particulars” of the artwork “to the general design” and make “all things subservient to that which is principal” (Sensus Communis IV.3, p. 66), adding that “common sense (according to just philosophy) judges of those works which want the justness of a whole and show their author, however curious and exact in particulars, to be in the main a very bungler” (Sensus Communis IV.3, p. 67). Hence it is the common sense (or “sense of beauty” as he calls it in The Moralists) which discerns “order and proportion” so that taste can approve or disapprove of them.

Now, Shaftesbury seems to think this ability of common sense to detect beauty is innate. When we perceive an object or action we immediately (“straight”) distinguish the beautiful from the ugly (The Moralists III.2, p. 326), Similarly, he says in the Inquiry that the mind “cannot be without .. nor can it withhold” judgments of moral taste, and he compares the functioning of the moral faculty to the functioning of a bodily organ: “this affection of a creature towards the good of the species or common nature is as proper and natural to him as it is to any organ, part or member of an animal body, or mere vegetable, to work in its known course and regular way of growth” (Inquiry II.I.1, 192). But these statements are misleading in isolation.

By this point in The Moralists, Shaftesbury has already observed that taste requires cultivation: “How long before a true taste is gained! How many things shocking, how many offensive at first, which afterwards are known and acknowledge the highest beauties! For it is not instantly we acquire the sense by which these beauties are discoverable” (The Moralists III. 2, p. 320). Shaftesbury also says (following the Cambridge Platonists) that the affection for and knowledge of the good can be lost by vice: “contrary habit and custom (a second nature) is able to displace” even the most natural instincts (Inquiry I.III.1, 179). Likewise in the Miscellaneous Reflections, Shaftesbury writes that “a legitimate and just taste can neither be begotten, made, conceived or produced without the antecedent labour and pains of criticism” (Miscellany III.2, p. 408).

If anything about the sensus communis or moral taste is innate, it is the potential to develop good taste. Everyone is born with these faculties. But everyone must be educated in how to use them. Moral taste is a natural faculty but it is also a cultivated faculty. Elsewhere Shafesbury argues that though “good rustics who have been bred remote from the formed societies of men” might have been “so happily formed by nature herself that, with the greatest simplicity or rudeness of education, they have still something of a natural grace and comliness in their action,” it is nevertheless “undeniable, however, that the perfection of grace and comliness of action and behavior can be found only among the people of a liberal education” since such perfection requires knowledge of “those particular rules of art which philosophy alone exhibits” (Soliloquy I.3 p. 85-7). So virtue must be cultivated like good taste in art or wine. Only then can one act “from his nature, in a manner necessarily and without reflection” (Sensus Communis IV.1, p. 60).

In summary, our moral sense is a not a special instinctive faculty, but an innate potential to approve of certain actions that must be activated by good education in society. Once we have been trained in the art of sociable conversation, our moral sense will inevitably approve of those actions which are motivated by the teleological good of society as a whole.

d. Personal Identity

In his essay Soliloquy Shaftesbury describes moral reasoning through the mechanism of conscience as requiring the agent to partition herself into multiple voices (or “selves”) in order to engage in fruitful internal discussion on the model of a Socratic dialogue. Soliloquy, he says, is a kind of “self-dissection” in which an individual “becomes two distinct persons” in order to “be his own subject” of advice and edification (Soliloquy I.i, p. 72). He calls “this method of soliloquy” an “art” or “regimen” which is “practiced” by “all great wits,” especially by “the poet and philosopher” and even “the orator” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 73).

Here soliloquy means something like the examination of conscience. The point of dividing oneself into two dialogue partners is to achieve the kind of consensus that results from rational discussion (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 77). We reflect within ourselves and notice that we are of two minds about something (we “discover a certain duplicity of soul”). Then we discuss the issue with ourselves until we bring the two views into dialectical agreement. In this way we achieve integrity and self-unity within our mind (we “make us agree with ourselves and be of a piece within”). In aesthetic terms, we are trying to bring our soul into harmony with itself.

For Shaftesbury, the purpose of soliloquy is not only self-creation, but also preparation for public discourse. It is significant that the full title of the essay is Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author, an “author” being one who “publishes” (makes public) his “meditations” (private thoughts). Shaftesbury’s advice is that we test our thoughts by the method of soliloquy before we presume to share them: “so that, unless the party has been used to play the critic thoroughly upon himself, he will hardly be found proof against the criticisms of others” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 76). What is significant here is that public edification is the assumed goal of philosophical thinking.

However, prior to public discourse, we must endeavor to construct a coherent self through the method of soliloquy. “Our thoughts,” says Shaftesbury, “have generally such an obscure implicit language that it is the hardest thing in the world to make them speak out distinctly. For this reason, the right method is to give them voice and accent” (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 78). By the method of giving voice to our thoughts here, Shaftesbury has in mind the “meditations, occasional reflections, solitary thoughts or other such exercises as come under the notion of this self-discoursing practice” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 74) that make up his own private notebooks which he labeled Askemata (exercises or “regimen”). In his Regimen Shaftesbury applies the practice of dialectical reasoning to his own inner life via the method of soliloquy.

For Shaftesbury, the result of achieving harmony of soul is the construction of a unified “self.” “It is the known province of philosophy,” Shaftesbury writes, “to teach us ourselves, keep us the self-same person and to regulate our governing fancies, passions and humors as to make us comprehensible to ourselves” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 127). With regard to the question of the self, Shaftesbury ridicules that “which stands for philosophy in some famous schools,” saying it cannot generate “manners or understanding” because “It pretends indeed some relation to manners as being definitive of the natures, essences and properties of spirits” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 128). In other words, scholastic philosophy confuses an accidental property (a “relationship”) of the self with an essential one. It does this by “defining ‘material’ and ‘immaterial substances’ and distinguishing their properties and modes” as if this were “the right manner of proceeding in the discovery of our own natures” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 129-130). This focus on the metaphysics of “modes and substances” is, however, “beside the mark and reaches nothing we can truly call our interest or concern.” It does not tell us who we really are (Soliloquy III.i, p. 130). The scholastics make the same mistake as a person who attempts to understand the nature of a watch by asking “of what metal or what matter each part was composed” rather than “what the real use was of such an instrument or by what movements its end was best attained and its perfection acquired” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 131). Likewise, the philosopher engaged in metaphysical speculation has “considered not the real operation or energy of his subject, nor contemplated the man as real man and as a human agent, but as a watch or common machine” (ibid).

Shaftesbury argues that true self-knowledge comes from the study of the passions. This is because I am my passions: “These passions, according as they have the ascendancy in me and differ in proportion with one another, affect my character and make me different with respect to myself and others” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 132). My character or self is a function of my passions, and that character is the real me, not the material (or immaterial) substance that my passions are made out of (or inhere in). Were my “passions, affections, and opinions” to change radically enough, then I would become a different self, even if, contra Locke, I retained in my “memory the faint marks or tokens of former transactions” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 127). This is because my passions are aimed at what I take to be my happiness (Soliloquy III.i, p 132). And, as the teleological end of my life, my happiness is what makes me who I am.

True philosophy, then, is the kind of self-reflection which makes known to an agent what her passions are aimed at so that she can bring them into harmony with one another and thereby construct a coherent self. Until I can understand my own passions (“ascertain my ideas”) and control them (“keep my opinion, liking and esteem of things the same” from moment to moment), I will remain “the same mystery to myself as ever” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 134), regardless of the truth of my metaphysical arguments.

The problem of an incoherent self arises primarily, in Shaftesbury’s view, when we define our lives in pursuit of pleasure. Pleasure is not stable, since pleasure comes from a variety of sources and the pursuit of pleasure demands a constant search for new sources, for “when we follow pleasure merely, we are disgusted and change from one sort to another, condemning that at one time which at another we earnestly approve, and never judging equally of happiness while we follow passion and mere humor” (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 138). What we need is a “rule of good” which can “control my fancy and fix it, if possible, on something which may hold good” (ibid). This is what Shaftesbury finds in the “honest pleasure” of moral beauty, the honestum which is both attractive and right.

Only the “pleasure of society” is “constant” enough to ground a coherent self, enabling me to “bring my other pleasures to correspond and be friends with it” (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 139). Thus, “when I employ my affection in friendly and social actions, I find I can sincerely enjoy myself” without risking the kind of self-dissolution which comes from pursuit of self-interested pleasures (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 138). Shaftesbury argues the pleasure I receive from moral affection is derived via sympathy (“by communication, a receiving it, as it were, by reflection”) from your enjoyment of my actions (Inquiry II.ii.1, p. 204). In the Inquiry Shaftesbury argues that human beings have natural affections for the good of society, and we cannot flourish as human beings unless we live in society and develop the virtues which allow us to live according to our nature. Thus we are not fully human if we are cut off from a sympathetic relationship with a community. What Shaftesbury adds in Soliloquy is to draw out the implication that we can only construct a self-identity on the basis of sympathetic pleasure. In this way we construct our identities out of our social interactions with others.

Thus Shaftesbury’s account of self-construction is essentially intersubjective and dialectical. It involves at least soliloquy if not actual interpersonal dialogue. Since it is often difficult to know what our true passions and opinions are, we need talk therapy (a “vocal looking-glass”) in the form of dialogue or soliloquy: “Our thoughts have generally such an obscure implicit language that it is the hardest thing in the world to make them speak out distinctly. For this reason, the right method is to give them voice and accent” (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 78).

Shaftesbury’s own dialogue The Moralists seems to be an example of this process since both characters in the dialogue present Shaftesburian viewpoints and help each other come to the truth (see Prince, p. 69). Indeed the assembled text of the Characteristics itself expresses this view through its literary structure. The Moralists is explicitly a dialogue. The treatise Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author, as its title implies, is an internal dialogue in which Shaftesbury is addressing himself. The Miscellaneous Reflections on the Preceding Treatises and Other Critical Subjects, Shaftesbury’s self-commentary, written in the third-person, are in effect an extended soliloquy that can be read as a dialogue between Shaftesbury the literary critic and Shaftesbury the philosopher. In this light we can see that even the (seemingly) ordinary philosophical treatise An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit takes on a dialogical character. Not only does the author of the Inquiry show up as a character in The Moralists (see II.3, p. 265), the Inquiry itself, when read in the overall context of the other more obviously dialogical works of the Characteristics and thus located amidst a series of overheard conversations, begins to read like an overheard scholastic-style philosophy lecture.

None of the individual treatises of the Characteristics is written unambiguously in Shaftesbury’s own voice. The character of “Shaftesbury,” the author of Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, emerges only as the harmonious unity of the other voices. In this way, the structure of Shaftesbury’s work as a whole is an embodiment of intersubjective reasoning. The truth of Shaftesbury’s philosophy is the product of a (metaphorical) community of persons reasoning together through (simulated) interpersonal dialogue. He is trying to achieve what he says Plato achieved in his Socratic dialogues: “they exhibited [real characters and manners] alive and set the countenances and complexions of men plainly in view. And by this means they not only taught us to know others, but, what was principal and of highest virtue in them, they taught us to know ourselves” (Soliloquy I.iii, p. 87).

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Texts

Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, ed. Lawrence E. Klein (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999) [Cited by treatise title, part, section, and page number.]
Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. The Life, Unpublished Letters, and Philosophical Regimen of Anthony, Earl of Shaftesbury, ed. Benjamin Rand (Macmillan, 1900)
Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. Second Characters or the Language of Forms, ed. Benjamin Rand (Cambridge University Press, 1914)

b. Secondary Texts

Secondary Texts
Aldridge, A.O. “Shaftesbury and the Deist Manifesto” Transactions of the American Philosophical Society, new series 41:2 (June, 1951)
Bernstein, John Andrew. Shaftesbury, Rousseau and Kant: An Introduction to the Conflict between Aesthetic and Moral Values in Modern Thought (Rutherford: Fairlegh Dickinson, 1980)
Cassirer, Ernst. The Platonic Renaissance in England, trans. James P. Pettegrove. (Austin: University of Texas Press, 1953)
Darwall, Stephen. The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’ (Cambridge University Press, 1995)
Den Uyl, Douglas J. “Shaftesbury and the Modern Problem of Virtue” Social Philosophy and Policy 15:1 (Winter 1998)
Gill, Michael. The British Moralists on Human Nature and the Birth of Secular Ethics (Cambridge, 2006)
Grean, Stanley. Shaftesbury’s Philosophy of Religion and Ethics (Ohio University Press, 1967)
Klein, Lawrence E. Shaftesbury and the Culture of Politeness: Moral Discourse and Cultural Politics in Early Eighteenth-Century England (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994)
Lawrence E. Klein, ‘Cooper, Anthony Ashley, third earl of Shaftesbury (1671–1713)’, Oxford Dictionary of National Biography, Oxford University Press, 2004; online edn, Jan 2008, http://www.oxforddnb.com/view/article/6209
Prince, Michael. Philosophical Dialogue in the British Enlightenment (Cambridge, 1996)
Raphael, D.D. The Moral Sense (Oxford University Press, 1947)
Rivers, Isabel. Reason, Grace, and Sentiment: A Study of the Language of Religion and Ethics in England, 1660-1780, Vol. II: Shaftesbury to Hume. (Cambridge University Press, 2000)
Schneewind, J.B. The Invention of Autonomy (Cambridge, 1998)
Voitle, Robert. The Third Earl of Shaftesbury, 1671-1713 (Louisiana State University Press, 1984)
Winkler, Kenneth P. “‘All is Revolution in Us’: Personal Identity in Shaftesbury and Hume” Hume Studies 26:1 (April, 2000)

Author Information

John McAteer
Email: jmcateer@hbu.edu
Houston Baptist University
U. S. A.

Personalism

Personalism is any philosophy that considers personality the supreme value and the key to the measuring of reality. Its American form took root in the late nineteenth century, flowered in the twentieth century, and continues its life in the twenty-first century. Yet, those roots can be traced to Europe and back through Western philosophy to the Mediterranean basin. However, Personalism did not originate exclusively in America, Europe, the Mediterranean basin, or in the West. Personalism thrived in India through the six orthodox schools of Indian philosophy scattered along the Indus River Valley of the Indian subcontinent, and developed parallel to Personalism in the West.

Personalists claim that the person is the key in the search for self-knowledge, for correct insight into reality, and for the place of persons in it. Other than giving centrality to the person, Personalism has no other set of principles or unified doctrine. Although many prominent personalists have been theists, this doctrine is not a requirement. There is also not a common set of methods or definitions, including the definition of person. Respecting that caution, personalists defend the primacy and importance of persons against any attempt to reduce persons either to the Impersonalism of an infrastructure, such as scientific naturalism, or suprastructure, such as metaphysical absolutism. Personalists focus on the concerns of persons living in a personal world. Between the Scylla and Charybdis of either type of Impersonalism, personalists trace the origin of the concept of person and the development of metaphysical personalism from the ancient world to its flowering in Europe and America. Open to the richness of their philosophical tradition, personalists trace their origin and development both on the Indian subcontinent and in the West.

South and East Asian Personalism
1. India
2. China and Japan
Historical Roots of Personalism in the Mediterranean Basin
European Development and Flowering
North American Personalism
Latin American Personalism
Current Trends
References and Further Reading

1. South and East Asian Personalism

a. India

The religious practice and thought spawned by the Vedic (from Veda, “knowledge,” “wisdom”) texts from at least 1500 BCE, form the back drop of Personalism. The term “Hindu” is derived from the river Sindhu (the Indus) where various schools of practice and thought had formed.

Broadly conceived, Personalism in India originates within the main goal of Hindu philosophical inquiry, which is the freedom from misery. Each system of Hindu philosophy seeks to help persons to that end by giving them insight into the nature of ultimate reality and their place in it. These systems advocate self-knowledge, atmavidya, without which the desired freedom is impossible. The nature and destiny of individual persons is the common theme of the six orthodox Hindu philosophical systems: Nyaya, Vaisesika, Sankhya, Yoga, Purva-mimamsa, and Vedanta. The Vaisesika school is frequently lumped together with the Nyaya (“Logic”) school, and Yoga is classically grouped with Sankhya. Each system promises self-knowledge, atmavidya that bonds the systems into a single philosophical tradition.

Seeking freedom from misery through self-knowledge, Hindu personalist schools of thought center on four questions. What is the self? How is it related to the material world? What is the relation of the self to ultimate reality? And, what is the path from pain and misery to liberation?

First, according to each orthodox school, persons are marked by various characteristics, including a permanent and eternal soul (atman) that exists behind the veil of empirical consciousness, and that possesses a physical body (jiva) that exists as part of a changing material world. While it is agreed that the Atman is eternal, unchanging, independent essence, the six orthodox schools differ whether the transcendent I is conscious or unconscious, active or passive. Each school also recognizes that by being connected to the material world persons possess other characteristics, including agency, will, thought, desire, free will, intention, and identity.

Second, personalists focus on the indissoluble reality of the individual soul and on its relation to the empirical consciousness. That soul, the basic reality in humans and all living things, is a transcendent “I,” (atman) and is veiled by a person’s empirical consciousness. It cannot be the object of experience. The empirical consciousness, the experience of objects sensed or being sensed, comes to be interpreted as alien, attributive, essential, adventitious, permanent, or temporary. Schools differ on how to correlate the transcendent “I” and the empirical consciousness. Hindu Personalism views the empirical consciousness as either attributive or alien, monist or dualist.

At one extreme, Sankhya, the oldest school, interprets the dualism of the transcendent “I” and the empirical consciousness as a dualism of spiritual consciousness (purusa) and material nature (prakrti). Purusa is sentient and passive; prakrti is insentient and active. As sentient, purusa experiences products of prakrti and desires emancipation. As passive, purusa can be understood as unaffected and secluded. In Samkhya, the material world is not an illusion; it is real and stands over against the spiritual person. This dualism is motivated by final beatitude. However, achieving it requires, in theistic versions of Sankhya, moral support, compassionate companionship and guidance from a Supreme Being who possesses perfect knowledge and is capable of perfect action. The Yoga thinker Pantanjali (ca. 300 CE) introduced God into atheistic Samkhyan dualism to satisfy the moral demand of the spiritual aspirant. With that addition, the Samkhyan school becomes a theistic Personalism.

At the other extreme, monism is represented as Advaita Vedanta (non-dualistic Vedanta). Sankara (c. 788-820), the leading expounder of Vedanta (literally, “the end of the Veda”) philosophy, states its principle insight that the self is One with Ultimate Reality (Brahman). Thus, the transcendent I includes the empirical many and the Divine One. The triune of Divine One (Brahman), the transcendent I (atman), and the empirical many is a grand unity. Sankara was the most influential Vedanta thinker who espoused the monistic framework as defined in the Upanishads – tat vam asi )”Thou art that” or (“Atman is Brahman”).

Self-knowledge is necessary for the soul to enter beatitude, to be one with Brahman. During a person’s life cycle, the caste system prescribed in the Vedas, eliminated the possibility of social movement, from lower to higher caste. Self-knowledge focused on one’s place in the caste system and its accompanying duties. The soul through its life cycle within a caste system sought virtue, allowing reincarnation in a higher caste. In this way, the virtuous soul achieves release from pain and suffering to Nirvana.

Within the unorthodox systems, such as Ajivikas (fatalists) Charvakas (materialists), Jains (who accept the existence of eternal selves but reject the existence of a supreme God) and Buddhism, Personalism does not develop. Ajivikas adopted materialism on the ground that sense-perception was the only valid means of knowledge. The Ajivika materialists questioned the validity of theological and metaphysical theories that do not come within the ambit of sense-experience. This explains why they rejected the religious version of atmavada, the belief in a metaphysical self.

Buddhism was founded by Siddhārtha Gautama (c. 563 BCE to 483 BCE), rejected the doctrines of atman or purusa and accepted instead a causal account (paticcasumuppada) of the human personalituy. The person, for Siddhartha, is a causally connected bundle of psychophysical aggregates (namarupa). Kasulis says, “According to Buddhism, therefore, I am not a self-existent being who chooses with what or how I wish to relate to external circumstances.” (Kasulis, 62-63) A Buddhist Personalism, the Pudgalavada arose two centuries after the lifetime of Siddhartha. Smet says, “The pudgalavadins thought that behind the aggregates or groups (skandha) of mental and physical conditions observed by introspection, there must a substrate. Had not the Budda, in a well-known passage, spoken of the ‘bearer of the burden’ – an expression seeming to indicate some sort of ego underlying the aggregates? At the same time the pudgala could by no means be identified with the Atman, because it was merely an integrating function demanded by the aggregates and expressed by them.” (De Smet. 38) Its teaching came too close to the heresy of the eternalism of the Atman and soon died out.

b. China and Japan

Regarding China and Japan, in neither country’s faiths are persons understood as an eternal essence. The Chinese, deeply influenced by Confucianism (551-479 BCE), believed that humans elevated themselves to a position through examinations and service. The Japanese, deeply influenced by Buddhism, understood persons in terms of their relationships with other humans, nature, and the totality of things. They held to a hierarchical dyadic view of persons.

Parallel to the origin and formation of Personalism in India, China, and Japan, Personalism in the West began in the Mediterranean basin, and through Christianity it spread north to the Atlantic Rim, northern Europe and the British Isles, and America.

2. Historical Roots of Personalism in the Mediterranean Basin

Personalists trace the origin of the ontological nature of persons and their supreme importance as key to understanding of Reality to the confluence of Greco-Roman philosophy and Christian experience and theology. Both made significant contributions to the formation of the concept of person.

In its early uses, the individual person had no ontological import. Person is first found in Greek and Roman culture. Its roots lie in the Greek word prosopon that refers to the face consisting of that around and near the eyes (pros + accusative of ops). Soon it designated the masks or faces used in the Greek theatre. Its Latin cognate is persona, probably of Etruscan derivation, phersu. Persona referred to a mask functioning as loudspeaker (persono, per, “through” + sona, “resound,” “resound thoroughly”). The mask was worn by actors on stage aiding them by “sounding through” to be heard by an audience. In the Roman theatre persona meant a character and role in tragedy or comedy. In Roman society, the personae of individuals gain their identity, status, and responsibilities from their roles in a hierarchical, honor-shame society. For example, persona came to be used in reference to the king as king, implying a difference between the important social man and the relatively unimportant singular empirical man. By the end of the second century CE persona became a judicial term referring to a Roman citizen as possessor of legal rights, in contrast to a slave who possesses no legal rights, a non-persona

Meanwhile, as Pythagorean, Platonic and Aristotelian philosophical influences continued, individual persons had little philosophical importance. Plato distinguishes between the individual and the universal, and thereby understands the individual through the universal. The individual Socrates participates in the universal, “human being.” To understand the particular “Socrates,” first know the universal, then one can understand and account for the particular. Pythagoras and Plato used the term soma, body, and played on the similarity between soma and sema, body and tomb. Aristotle, against Plato, calls the individual primary substance and the universal conceptual. First substance is that which stands under (hypostasis) a general term referring to whatever stands under something else. But prosopon gained no ontological meaning through that understanding of substance.

Later, persona took on scant ontological meaning among the Stoics and the Neoplatonists. Stoics thought that God forms an ordered universe, a stage on which each human being as rational plays an assigned part. Each prosopon or persona is not only a social role but also the essence of a human being as constituted by God. Possessing no ontological significance in and of themselves, persons are microcosms of the Macrocosm.

In the eastern Mediterranean among the Jews, the Hebrew word, nephesh is sometimes translated as “person.” However, in ancient Hebrew life and culture no word analogous to prosopon or persona appears. Nephesh is more often translated as soul, life, creature, or self. Nephesh can refer to the animating principle of a physical entity or the existential quality or state of life. Usually referring to a human being as a unified entity, no distinction is made between immaterial and material aspects. Nephesh as a whole is created by God; nephesh is not an attribute of a substance. The form/matter and substance attribute distinctions are foreign to ancient Hebrew thinking. However, beginning with Alexander the Great in the 4^th century BCE and continuing through the Roman period, the Eastern Mediterranean was Hellenized. New Testament writers, St. Paul for example, would have known nephesh, prosopon, and persona, likely aware of semantic tensions that later found their way in theological debates within the Christian church.

The different Greek and Hebrew-Christian understandings of person moved into focus in the 4th and 5^th centuries CE as the Christian church attempted to work out a satisfactory understanding of the Trinity and the individual personhood of Jesus the Christ. The details of the controversies that arose are beyond the limits here. However, central to the controversy was the understanding of the individual person. During the time of Origen (185-254 CE) under the influence of Plotinus (204-269 CE), personae lacked ontological content. Is an individual person an attribute of being; or is an individual person being who, having been created by the free and independent God and who bears God’s image, is free and dependent? If the former, the Greek metaphysical word, ousia, expresses the Trinity, as in una substantia (God) and tres personae, where Father, Son, and the Holy Spirit are understood as three independent Gods. If the latter, person is not an attribute of ousia, but upostasis. Earlier both ousia and upostasis meant substance. Eventually, they were used separately, ousia referring to substance and upostasis referring to individual person. This means that persona is no longer a kind of mask worn by an ontological substrate, ousia. The Greek Fathers, particularly the Cappadocians, led by Gregory of Nazianus (c. 329 – 389 or 390) understood that individual persons are ontologically ultimate, the central thesis of Personalism. However, an understanding of the interior life of persons lay beyond their metaphysical interests.

The analysis of the interior life of persons fell to Augustine (354 – 430) who continued the substance view by defining person as “a rational soul using a mortal and earthly body,” (substantia quaedam rationis particeps, regendo corpora accomodata). Nevertheless, a person is one; “a soul in possession of a body does not constitute two persons but one man.” His contribution to Personalism lies elsewhere. His investigation of the inner experience of persons set a new course in philosophy that would not be developed until the modern period. In doing so he developed a key insight of Personalism, an understanding of reality as Person through an understanding of the interior life of persons. He wrote that knowledge of God moves “from the exterior to the interior and from the inferior to the superior.” Further, he argues that in persons, free will is superior to rationality. Yet Augustine continued the metaphysical principle that the higher can affect the lower, but the lower cannot affect the higher.

In the late Roman era or early Middle Ages, the Roman Catholic Church adopted Boethius’ (ca. 480–524 or 525) definition of person, as the Naturæ rationalis individua substantia (an individual substance of a rational nature). In the meantime, the Greek Orthodox Church continued the doctrines of the Cappadocians, particularly Gregory of Nazianus. Though medieval philosophers, such as Thomas Aquinas modified the definition and some such as Scotus and William of Occam were critical, the substance view of person became firmly entrenched in Western philosophy. During the modern period and the nineteenth and twentieth century personalists continued to debate the substance view of persons.

3. European Development and Flowering

As the grand systems of Christendom in the high Middle Ages cracked under the weight of heavy criticisms from Scotus, Occam, Montaigne, and the new science, a new vision arose in the Renaissance, the emerging self. Though the substance view of persons continued, aided by its institutionalization in the Western church, it was soon challenged. Under Pico della Mirandola, Luther, Descartes, and Locke, Augustine’s careful descriptions and insights into the interior life of persons contributed to emerging selves.

Influenced of pyrrhonistic skepticism, Descartes (1596 – 1650) searched for a new foundation for society, culture, and knowledge, one that measures up to the ideal of certainty as in mathematics. He argues that we can know for certain that we exist and that we can doubt every other knowledge claim, including those of the external world. In this way, inspired by new scientific investigations, he raises problems, particularly the mind-body problem. Rather than the view that God created ex nihilo substances with a rational nature, or persons are substances using a body, Descartes contends that God created two substances, res cogitans and res extensa, mind and body. Central to his view of mind is freedom of the will and rationality. In freedom of the will we find a characteristic of God that is exactly the same as we find in ourselves. God’s reason is so far beyond our finite minds that we cannot with confidence claim that God is rationality. Descartes’ discussion of the interior life of persons in the early 17^th century CE continues Augustine’s insights in the late 4^th century CE. However, Descartes’ dualism of two kinds of created substances significantly differs from Boethius’ view that a person is an individual substance with a rational nature. Though modified, the substance of persons persisted.

The dichotomy of thought (res cogitans) and extension (res extensa) raises formidable problems regarding the relation between them, encouraging some philosophers to emphasize one or the other. For example, Hobbes’(1588 – 1679) materialism on the side of extended things, and Berkeley’s (1685-1753 CE) spiritualism on the side of thinking things. Hobbes’ view is a good example of appealing to impersonal principles to account for persons, a view personalists uniformly reject as a form of Impersonalism. Berkeley’s view moves Personalism into modern Idealism (mentalism), in contrast to classical Idealism (Ideaism) such as Plato’s, and against the Impersonalism of materialism. Under the influence of Locke and against any form of materialism, Berkeley took what he believed a common sense approach. Holding to a substance view of person, he claimed that “to be is to be perceived or perceive,” esse est percipi aut percipere. The key lies in the word “exist.” Descartes had said that things exist either as thought or extension. However, thought Berkeley, whenever we use the word “exist” we must assume that the mind is involved perceiving something. And, when we or no other person perceives an object, that object exists due to its being perceived by a cosmic mind, God. The “absolute existence of unthinking things [matter] are words without meaning.” Neither do eternal ideas, Plato’s forms, exist apart from perceiving minds. They are abstractions only.

Descartes’ position helped create a modern version of the One and Many problem, first spawned by the Pre-Socratics. Descartes held that God can be grasped through ideas in the mind. Spinoza (1632 –1677) responded that God as substance is not dependent on any other than itself. If God could be grasped through a dependent substance, such as thought, God would be dependent on something other than God’s self for God’s existence. Here, two fundamental characteristics of Personalism were threatened, the rational relation of finite persons to God, and persons as free. Since knowledge of the Cosmic Person through a finite person challenges God as Substance, the relation of the Cosmic Person to finite person becomes problematic. Furthermore, persons as free can be held only so long as Cosmic Person and finite persons are in some way independent. Spinoza claimed that substance can be known only through itself, implying that persons are modifications of being, that they are not distinct as required for individual freedom.

In reaction to Descartes’ dualism and Spinoza’s monism, Leibniz’s (1646 –1716) doctrine of monads offers a pluralism. Both Descartes and Spinoza assumed that extension implies actual size and shape. Leibniz wondered why we cannot assume that all things are compounds or aggregates of simple substances. These substances are not the extended atoms of Democritus or Epicurus. Each simple substance is a monad that is unextended and has no size or shape. Each is a metaphysical point that Leibniz calls souls to emphasize their nonmaterial nature. And, each possesses its own principle of action within itself and behaves according its own created purpose, yet they work together according to God’s preestablished harmony. A person’s identity centers on a dominant monad, his soul, whose life is an “unfolding,” set from the beginning. Since the basic nature of persons is thought, development through life means moving from murky confused ideas to true ones, the way things really are. In this way, Leibniz was the first philosopher to reject the substance of persons and to adopt an agency view, even if deterministic. Some philosophers, such as Leroy E. Leomker (1770-1830), consider Leibniz the first modern personalist, where persons are agents, not substances with an attribute.

Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) and Hegel (1770-1830) exerted major influences on the formation and development of Personalism in the West. Kant’s distinction between the phenomenal and noumenal world reinforced Berkeley’s view of “material” substance and emphasized that the only path to reality is through the practical reason of persons. With his claim that compliance with moral law is the essence of human dignity and personhood, Kant exerted the single most influence on ethical personalists. That influence was transmitted into American philosophy largely through the work of Hermann Lotze (1817-1881).

Within that background, the modern Personalist vision was first stated in the context of a philosophical issue lying at the core of 18^th and 19^th century German philosophy. The issue was raised in the debate between the followers of Spinoza and those of Leibniz. For Spinozists, Being is one and independent. If Being were more than one, it would not be independent; and, if Being is independent it cannot be many. For Leibnizians, reality is a pluralism of monads. The debate between the two systems sharpened to the debate between monism and pluralism. The problem of the One and the Many resurfaced. How can they be reconciled? What philosophical view can do so? At least two alternatives surfaced at the end of the 18^th century and the beginning of the 19^th.

The first alternative was Hegel’s. According to a recent interpreter, he sought a “‘unification philosophy’ – the need to unify not only life’s various and conflicting powers, but especially the opposing human craving – for individuality and finitude, on the one hand, and for the absolute and the infinite, on the other.” (Hegel, 48) Hegel sought it by brilliantly blending the organic growth of an Aristotle and the Absolutism of a Spinoza into a dynamic monistic system marked by idealism, pantheism, and rationalism.

In reaction to the rationalism of Absolute Idealism and to individual realism, a poet and philosopher and older contemporary of Hegel, Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi (1743-1819) offered the second alternative, Personalism. He thought that Personalism is “‘that form of idealism which gives equal recognition to both the pluralistic and monistic aspects of experience and which finds in the conscious unity, identity, and free activity of personality the key to the nature of reality and the solution of the ultimate problems of philosophy.’” (Bengtsson, 53) The insight of Jacobi continued in Schelling, in the Speculative theists (Immanuel Hermann Fichte, Weisse, Ulrici), to Hermann Lotze, the preeminent philosopher in mid-19th century Germany. It was primarily through Lotze that Personalism arrived in Boston. When Personalism arrives in Boston the distinctive modern characteristics of persons are in place: numerically distinct; individual interiority; freedom of choice among genuine options; autonomy; dignity; and agency. As Personalism makes its way to Boston and the West Coast, Personalism on the European continent and in England responds to German Idealism, specifically to Hegel.

In the debate between monism and pluralism, the traditional problem of the One and the Many resurfaces. But more, metaphysical monism and pluralism lie beneath many modern philosophies that Personalism rejects as impersonal, dehumanizing. Absolute idealism leaves little room for free will and self-determination and cannot be reconciled with the worth of the singular person. Totalitarianisms see persons as means to an end that exist for the interests of the state. Personalists respond insisting on self-determination, responsibility, inherent dignity of all persons. Individualism champions the autonomous self as its own law giver, making all other persons a means to one’s own ends. Personalism contends persons are communal, open to, cooperating with, and respecting the viewpoints of others. Personalism also rejects any reduction of persons to impersonal, deterministic laws, whether those of society, for example Auguste Comte (1798-1857), or of nature, Darwinism evolution. Personalists challenge Comtean philosophical positivism and Naturalism whether that of Darwinism or Samuel Alexander (1859-1938) by appealing to the dignity of individual persons, their free will, and values.

On the European continent, responses to Hegel led to the development of three schools: Paris, Gottingen/Freiburg, and Lublin. In Paris and under the influence of Existentialism, Mounier (1905-1950), Marcel (1889-1973), Paul Ricoeur (1913-2005), and Jacques Maritain (1882-1973) developed distinctive types of Personalism. In Gottingen and Feiburg Phenomenology developed under Husserl (1859-1938) who addressed the question of the relation of objective reality and philosophical reflection. Later he returned to Idealism, precipitating a break with his former students, who, when on their own, made significant contributions to Personalism. These included Max Scheler (1874 – 1928), Dietrich von Hildebrand (1889-1977), Roman Ingarden (1893-1970), and Edith Stein (1891-1942). In Poland, the Catholic University of Lublin is a center of personalist thought whose foremost representative is Karol Wojtyla (1920-2005). Personalism also developed in Prague at Charles University and under the leadership of Jan Patočka (1907 – 1977), one of Husserl’s last students. In Spain José Ortega y Gasset (1883 – 1955) espoused personalist themes. In Italy, Antonio Pavan of University of Padua ably represents Personalism. Personalism also has its adherents in Scandanavia, such as Jan Olof Bengtsson in Sweden. In Scotland the most notable 19^th century personalist was Seth Andrew Pringle-Pattison (1856 – 1931), whose thought influenced William James (1842-1910), George Santayana (1863-1952), and George Herbert Mead (1863-1931). In England, Austin Farrer (1904-1968) argued for a personalist theism. John MacMurray (1891 – 1976) was the most notable Scottish Personalist in the first half of the 20^th century. In Russia we find a version of Personalism in Berdyaev’s (1874-1948) thought.

4. North American Personalism

Before the mid-19^th century few in North America discussed the thought of German philosophers such as Kant, Johann Gottlieb Fichte (1762-1814), Schelling (1775-1854), Hegel, and Lotze. As demands of academic life increased, young American philosophers completed their philosophical preparation with a year or two of study in Germany. When they returned, no longer fully embracing the old Scottish orthodoxy, their thinking was framed by the Spinoza-Leibniz debate, sometimes understood by theologians and many philosophers as the pantheism-individual freedom debate, and by reductions of persons to deterministic laws of society and nature. Deliberating within that framework, they thoroughly discussed the Personalism they learned while studying with Hermann Lotze at Gottingen. Among that group were George Santayana (who wrote his doctoral dissertation at Harvard University on Lotze), William James (1863-1952), Josiah Royce (1855-1916), and Borden Parker Bowne (1847-1910). That conversation grew into what Werkmeister in the mid-20^th century calls the “first complete and comprehensive system of philosophy developed in America which has had lasting influence and which still counts some of our outstanding thinkers among its adherents.” (Werkmeister, 103.)

a. Branches of Personalism

Those historical roots found their way into American philosophy and formed at least four distinctive branches of Personalism. These four branches are idealistic (against threat of naturalism and realism), realistic (against reducing all to mind or person), organismic (against idealism, personalistic realism), and ethical (against collectivism and reduction of personality to mechanism and the body-brain).

Idealistic Personalism – The most distinctive type of Personalism in America, excluding Platonism or Kantianism, this idealism is expressed in three different forms: absolutistic, panpsychistic, and personalistic. Influenced by Jamesian pragmatism, Absolutistic idealists contend that reality is quantitatively and qualitatively one absolute mind, spirit, or person. All other beings, including physical and human ones, are ontologically manifestations of the absolute mind. Josiah Royce, William Ernest Hocking (1873-1966), and Mary Whiton Calkins (1863-1929) represented this view. Panpsychists are deeply influenced by Leibniz, who held that God, the supreme monad, creates all other monads and places them in a preestablished harmony. Rejecting absolute idealism, they hold that reality is composed of psychic entities of varying degrees of consciousness. Both A. N. Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000) can be called, with qualification, panpsychists. Finally, for personalistic idealists, quantitatively, reality is pluralistic, a society of persons; and qualitatively, reality is monistic; it is person. The Infinite Person or God is the ground of all beings and the creator and sustainer of finite persons. In that sense, personalistic idealists are theistic. Representatives of this branch of Personalism include Borden Parker Bowne, Edgar Sheffield Brightman (1884-1953), Peter A. Bertocci (1910-1989), and Leroy Loemker (1900-1985).

Realistic Personalism – These personalists agree with idealistic personalists that Reality is spiritual, mental, and personal. They disagree about the ontological status of the natural order. Nature is neither intrinsically mental nor personal. It is a natural order created by God. Realistic personalism is most notably expressed by Neo-Scholastics in Europe such as Jacques Maritain (1882-1973), Emmanuel Mounier (1905-1950), and Pope John Paul II (1920-2005), and in America W. Norris Clarke (1915- 2008) and John F. Crosby (1944 -). In America some realistic personalists stand outside the scholastic tradition, notably Georgia Harkness (1891-1974).

Personalistic Organicism – A recent form of Personalism was developed by Frederick Ferre (1933-2013). Rejecting panpsychism and personalistic idealism and influenced by Whitehead’s philosophy of organism, Ferre argues for a personalistic organicism. He claims in Living and Values that persons are “organisms with especially well-developed mental capacities leading to special needs and powers.” (Ferre, Living, 140) By these powers they can “perceive and manipulate the world, can vocalize and socialize, can create language, can imagine and plan by use of symbols freed from the immediate environment, and can guide behavior by ideal norms.” (Ferre, Living, 140)

Ethical Personalism – These personalists stress the crucial role of values in ontology and the moral life. Ethical Personalism is well represented by George Holmes Howison (1834-1916) who focuses on the Ideal or God toward which all uncreated persons move and the standard by which they measure the degree of their individual self-definition. Practically, ethical personalists concentrate on the dignity and value of persons in moral decision making.

b. Major figures

i. Harvard University

Josiah Royce’s thought was motivated by a religious view of life and reality, with an emphasis on the self and community. He sought to realize his philosophical goals through a synthesis of two traditions: the rationalistic system building of philosophers in the West, and the pragmatic emphasis on experience and practice, distinctive of American philosophical activity since the late nineteenth century. Royce also had a long and abiding interest in science and scientific inquiry and was deeply influenced by Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914). He wove these strands during his long and productive career.

At the root of Royce’s system is a concept of the self. Early in his career, the Absolute appears as the Self who knows all in one synoptic vision. Rejecting realism, mysticism, and critical rationalism, his central thesis is that to be real is to be a determinate, individual fulfillment of a purpose. Later he focused more on mediation and the idea of system. Toward the end of his career, the self appears as social. He developed a social theory of reality, a community of interpretation. He called this community “the Beloved Community” whose goal was to possess the truth in its totality.

William James, a leading pragmatist, shared with personalists a key insight. James said, “The more perfect and more eternal aspect of the universe is represented in our religions as having personal form. The universe is no longer a mere It to us, but a Thou, if we are religious; and any relation that may be possible from person to person might be possible here.” (William James, 27-28)

Mary Whiton Calkins, a student of Josiah Royce and William James at Harvard, taught psychology, classics, and philosophy at Smith College. Influenced by Royce and James, she adopted a monistic personal idealism and a personalistic psychology. In 1905, Calkins was elected president of the American Psychological Association and in 1918, she was elected president of the American Philosophical Association.

William Ernest Hocking believed the universe is independent of human minds but is discoverable through phenomenology. Sometimes thought of as the American Husserl, he studied for three months with Husserl at Gottingen. Scolded by the Harvard Philosophy Department for wasting his time with an unknown philosopher, he went to Berlin to complete his year abroad. Yet, Husserl’s phenomenology made a deep impression on Hocking. Through careful phenomenological analysis, Hocking unpacked everyday phenomena and found that “nature can no longer be fully understood from the atoms upward but only from consciousness or selfhood outwardly.” (Howie, “Hocking’s ‘Transfigured Naturalism,’” 219) Philosophy must be idealistic. Further, values keep emerging as we learn more about the world and ourselves. The mental life has unity, is deep and mysterious, and finally coheres in a single will. The finite person is an imperfect image of the universe. Influenced by personal idealism and Royce’s absolute idealism, the final unity is a self infinite in depth and mystery. The self or person is also a natural thing that is completely determined. More than a natural thing, the self is free to determine what will be fact in the next moment. Though nature and mind are in opposition to each other, one subject to the laws of nature, the other transcending them, through the ceremonies of religion that opposition is overcome.

ii. Boston University

Borden Parker Bowne claimed to be the first personalist in any thoroughgoing sense, having developed a systematic metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, and psychology. He taught at Boston University from 1876 until his death in 1910. Metaphysically Bowne was a pluralistic idealist like Howison. But his theism distinguishes his Personalism from Howison’s. God, the Divine Person, is both creator and world ground. Finite selves are created, and nature is the energizing of the Cosmic Mind. As world ground, the Divine Mind is the “self-directing intelligent agency” that accounts for the order and continuity of the phenomenal world.

Bowne was not only a systematic philosopher but also a caustic critic of Hegel’s absolutism, Spencer’s evolutionism, and all forms of materialism. These criticisms were expressed in his famous chapter in Personalism, “The Failure of Impersonalism.” In addition, any form of dogmatism or fundamentalism was the target of his searing attacks, especially when held by religious leaders in the Methodist Church.

Bowne’s teaching at Boston University attracted many young talented philosophers, some of whom formed the second generation of personalists in America. The most important among them were Albert Knudson (1873-1953), who continued the personalist tradition in the Divinity School of Boston University; Ralph Tyler Flewelling (1871-1960), who developed the School of Philosophy at the University of Southern California; and Edgar Sheffield Brightman, who led the Philosophy Department at Boston University from 1919 until his death in 1953.

Brightman (1884-1953) was the leading exponent in America of Personalist Idealism during the first half of the 20^th century CE. Educated at Brown, Brightman earned his doctorate in Philosophy at Boston University under the founder of Personalism in America, Borden Parker Bowne.

Though an ordained Methodist minister and an authority on the Old Testament, for most of his scholarly life his central interests lay in the fields of Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, and Metaphysics.

A creative, brilliant, original philosopher, Brightman, in agreement with other Boston University personalists, sought truth to guide creative living in the most empirically coherent interpretation of experience. Rejecting the skepticism of Descartes, beginning the search for truth within experience, and advancing and testing hypotheses, Brightman developed the distinction between the shining present and the illuminating absent. Pointing beyond itself, the shining present is unintelligible without reference to an illuminating absent. Though the shining present does not prejudice the nature of the illuminating absent, Person is the hypothesis that most coherently illumines the shining present.

Brightman contended that everything that exists [or subsists] is in, of, or for a mind on some level. He defined Personalism as the hypothesis that all being is either a personal experience (a complex unity of consciousness) or some phase or aspect of one or more such experience. Nature is an order generated by the mind of Cosmic Person. Finite persons are created and grounded by the uncreated God, and as such possess free will. Reality is a society of persons.

Brightman’s most impressive work is his Moral Laws, in which he works out, along lines heavily indebted to Hegel, a thoroughgoing ethical theory. In ethics Brightman adopted perfectionism that moved from the abstract universal to the concrete universal. In its moral development, personality should be guided by moral laws, a kind of “regulatory system.” Understood dialectically, “the moral life is a special instance of the relation of the universal to the particular,” wherein the personality can achieve both the best possible and rational freedom. (Deats and Robb, 111) In this way, personality under the guidance of reason, seeks to become the best it can be, a fully integrated personality.

Central to his philosophy of religion is his well-known revision of the traditional view of God. If personality is the basic explanatory model, God must be seen as temporal. As temporal, God is not timeless but omnitemporal. Brightman agrees with the traditional view of God as infinite in goodness, but he disagrees that God is infinite in power. To maintain that God’s power is infinite seriously compromises the goodness of God. If evil is to be taken seriously, the will of God must be understood as limited by the nonrational Given within God’s nature. This nonrational condition in God is neither created nor approved by God, but God maintains constant and growing control of it. This controversial view was debated within personalist circles. For example, L. Harold DeWolf (1905-1906) followed Bowne’s traditional theism rather than Brightman’s, and Peter A. Bertocci (1910-1989) found in Brightman’s revisions a cogent and intelligible theism.

Bertocci, following Brightman as the leading personalist at Boston University, enriched the understanding of person through his work in psychology. Bertocci claims in “Why Personalistic Idealism?” that the person “is a self-identifying, being-becoming agent who maturing and learning as he interacts with the environment, develops a more or less systematic, learned unity of expression and adaptation that we may call his personality.” Bertocci is well known for his view that the essence of person is time. He is best known in the field of philosophy of religion for his wider teleological argument that provided increased evidence for God’s existence.

iii. California

Personalism simultaneously developed in Boston and California. One of the first American philosophers to employ the term Personalism was Howison at the University of California. After graduating from Harvard and early in his career, he was one of the St. Louis Hegelians. A thorough discussion of Hegel, however, led Howison to champion the finite individual and reject the absorption of the individual in the Absolute. In this way, Howison opposes Royce’s absolutism.

Howison succinctly stated his position, quoted by Buckman and Stratton in George Holmes Howison, “All existence is either (1) the existence of minds, or (2) the existence of the items and order of their experience; all the existences known as ‘material’ consisting in certain of these experiences, with an order organized by the self-active forms of consciousness that in their unity constitute the substantial being of a mind, in distinction from its phenomenal life.” Devoted to empiricism, Howison rejected creation. “These many minds . . . have no origin at all – no source in time whatever. There is nothing at all, prior to them, out of which their being arises. . . . They simply are, and together constitute the eternal order.” Collectively they move toward their own fulfillment as measured by the eternal standard to God.

Later at the Univesity of Southern California, Ralph Tyler Flewelling, a student of Bowne’s Personalism, taught Boston University Personalism as enriched into Democratic Personalism. He defined person as “A self-conscious unique unity capable of reflection upon its conscious states, of self-direction and transcending time. The self-identifying subject of experience, possessor of intrinsic values and creative powers. A continuum in a time-space world.” (quoted in Gacka, “American Personalism,” 160; also see R. T. Flewelling, The Person; or The Significance of Man,” 332). Emphasizing personal freedom, dignity, human potential, creativity, intrinsic moral worth, and community, Flewelling promoted Personalistic Democracy. He said, “The only abiding basis for democracy is respect for the sanctity of the person.” This includes respect for those “possibilities which reside in varying degree in every person. . . This means that personality is recognized as an intrinsic value, the most precious possession of society and the greatest source of social ‘advance and welfare.’” (Gacka, 161)

c. African Personalism

African personalists focus on total liberation and empowerment of African Americans, releasing them from oppression, and on the dignity and self-worth, especially lacking among young African American males. The conception of persons and God and the primacy of person are two appealing features of Personalism. Among American African personalists, the best known was Martin Luther King (1929-1968). King translated Personalism into social action by applying it to racism, economic exploitation, and militarism. Following closely its major themes, he emphasized the existence of a personal God, the dignity and sacredness of persons, the existence of an objective moral order and corresponding moral laws, freedom, and moral agency. ” (Burrows, Personalism, 77-78) However, the precedent for King’s social Personalism was set by John Wesley Edward Bowen (1855-1923), a student of Bowne’s, whom Burrows cites in Personalism as the “first African American academic personalist.” Rufus Burrow, Jr. (1951-) argues for a militant Personalism that considers the African American experience. Holding firmly to central personalist themes, he argues in Personalism for the sanctity of the body, the dignity of women, “we-centeredness plus I-centeredness,” preference for the poor and oppressed, immediate and radical social change, and respect for non-human life forms.

Earlier, John Wesley Edward Bowen (1855-1933) became the first African American to earn a Ph.D. degree at Boston University. Devoted to the centrality of person, Bowen argued that the importance of higher education for blacks lay in developing persons into men and women who would occupy important positions in society. Bowen also argued that progress must be intentional and accepted as slow, that social problems must be solved individualistically, and for a “concrete, not abstract ‘brotherhood’ of all persons.” (Burrows, Personalism, 80)

Recently, J. Deotis Roberts (1927- ), a student of the British personalist Herbert H. Farmer and a black liberation theologian, emphasized that the conscious person is both “the highest intrinsic value and is personal, emphasis on freedom and self-determination, and focus on persons-in-community.” (Burrows, Personalism, 80). His thought can be organized around four personalist principles: the dignity of the whole person, God as personal, freedom and moral agency, and persons-in-community. Blacks are not subhuman, as they have often been treated; they possess intrinsic worth as whole persons and not as minds and bodies. The God of the Bible is personal and loves each of the creatures. Though God is responsible for all that happens in the world, humans are responsible for all moral wrongdoing. Finally, humans can fulfill, develop themselves only in community, which implies “sharing and caring based upon fellow feeling and deep fellowship. Ujamaa, ‘togetherness,’ ‘familyhood,’ is descriptive of community.” (Roberts, quoted by Burrows, Personalism, 85)

Feminists agree with the Personalism of Roberts and other black liberation theologians, but they emphasize the dignity and worth of black women to a degree unknown before. They do so in the context of the four personalist principles mentioned above.

d. American Indian Personalism

Vine Deloria, Jr. (1933 – 2005), a Standing Rock Sioux, exploring the metaphysics of American Indians finds personalistic themes, including a personal universe, dignity and sacredness of life, the existence of a moral order, and moral responsibility.

Every individual, whether a person, a tree, a bison, an alligator, or the sun are fundamental to the world we live in. Never isolated, what they are is constituted by their relationships. Each individual has a personality distinguished by its power and place. Power is the living energy that inhabits the universe, and place is the relationship an individual has to other individuals. More broadly, place is the relationships of things to each other. In this way, an ear of corn is distinguished from the person who picks it and from the buffalo that provides meat for nourishment and hides for shelter and clothing. Power and place contribute to one’s habitude, “an attitude or awareness of a deep system of experiential relations on which the world is building or living. The key here is recognizing that experience is the undeveloped and untheorized site where the divisions between subjective and objective, material and spiritual, and an entire series of dichotomies disappear.” (Wildcat, “Understanding the Crisis,” in Power and Place, 34). One acquires this through the clan system developed in geographical and ecological environments. For example, the Seminole, living in the wetlands of Florida establish an important relationship the alligator, while the Cherokee, living in the mountains of North Carolina do not. One’s habitude contributes to the richness of one’s personality, to one’s interrelationships with other individuals, and to an understanding of the path one is to walk. Power, place, and habitude suggest that the interrelated universe is alive and personal and must be approached with respect. Living and its quality depend on it.

All relationships have a moral content. Contemplating an action, a person must consider whether the proposed action is appropriate. Harvesting plants involves respecting the plants, their power and place in relationship to other individuals. Considering the impact on others and the consequences of one’s action, one must never intrude into the lives of other. The universe is built upon constructive and cooperative relationships that must be maintained.

Not only must one’s actions correlate with other personalities but also with the larger movements of the universe. They followed the principle that whatever is above must be reflected below. In their villages most tribes constructed their dwellings after some model of the universe. They reproduced the cosmos in miniature and believed that spiritual change would be followed by physical change. In this way, they participated in cosmic rhythms.

Through these relationships humans understand what they are, what they are to be, and what they are to do. Deloria points out that “everything that humans experience has value and instructs in some aspect of life. . . . The real interest of the old Indians was not to discover the abstract structure of physical reality but rather to find the proper road along which for the duration of a person’s life, individuals were supposed to walk. . . . The universe is a moral universe.” (Mankiller, “Foreward,” in Spirit and Reason, vii)

5. Latin American Personalism

Personalism in Latin America developed in the 20^th century against the historical background of scholasticism (16^th– 19^th centuries) and naturalism and positivism (19^th century). The contemporary period (late 20^th into 21^st centuries) continued idealistic and personalistic discussions of axiology and social philosophy, manifested a shyness regarding metaphysics, emphasized existentialist themes, and witnessed the rise of dialectical materialism. The discussion of Personalism chiefly took place in three centers of philosophical activity, Argentina, Mexico, and Puerto Rico.

In Argentina, two philosophers distinguished themselves. Alejandro Korn (1860-1936), in reaction to positivism, introduced German philosophy to his countrymen and was known as “the teacher of knowledge and virtue” and “The Philosopher of Liberty.” Emphasizing the role of intuition as the basis of knowledge and the social idealism, his views were not fully developed. Franscisco Romero (1891-1962), a younger contemporary of Korn, arriving at his philosophy by way of psychology, was a sworn foe of mechanistic and behaviorist view of persons. Persons are whole, a structure not determined by its parts. They are both of the psyche, the lower, subjective, egotistic aspect of the self; and spirit, the objective and altruistic tendencies of the self. He thought that person is the key to reality. Persons have the ability to transcend subjectivity and grasp a superindividual order, and order that transcends him. Romero thought Josiah Royce’s The World and the Individual as the greatest contribution America has made to systematic and speculative philosophy.

Mexico is the second outstanding center of philosophical activity. Chief among its eminent thinkers is José Vasconcelos (1882-1959). Though critical of idealism and leaning decidedly toward Thomistic realism, he is deeply theistic and personalistic. Holding to a theistic monism, the universe is a living whole that finds its unity in God. His chief themes are individuality, freedom, purposeful creativity, cosmic reality in process, personality, and God. Vasconcelos, unlike most philosophers in North America, was a man of action, standing for the president of Mexico, though never elected. Bergson’s call to philosophers to “think like men of action and act like men of thought” was often heeded in Latin America.

The third center is Puerto Rico, whose most distinguished thinker was Eugenio Maria de Hostos (1839-1903). An ethical and social idealist, Hostos stressed the supreme worth personality, the dignity of persons. That is the foundation stone of civilization itself. No mere ivory tower, idealistic thinker, Hostos gave a realistic analysis of the danger inherent in what he called our “machine civilization.”

In addition to those centers of philosophical activity and their signal figures, other philosophers who discussed personalist themes were Antonio Caso in Mexico (1883-1946), Alejandro Deustua (1849-1945) and Victor Andres Belaunde (1883-1966) in Peru, Enrique Molina in Chile, and Carlos Vas Ferreira (1872-1959) in Uruguay. Recently, Ignacio Ellacuria (1930-1989) of San Salvador developed Liberation Philosophy that focused on the social and personal imperative to overcome dependency as the path toward the fullness of one’s humanity. Common themes among them include dynamic stress on action, the philosophy of persons, freedom of persons, and the law.

Regarding direct of influence of North American Personalism on Latin American philosophers, when Latin American philosophers became aware of North American philosophy, it was Personalism, especially that of Edgar Sheffield Brightman that attracted them most among then-living philosophers. Josiah Royce also attracted them, especially The World and the Individual, as we have seen. But, it was Brightman’s Personalism that exerted the greatest influence. The interest was reciprocal. Brightman established the first graduate course in Latin American philosophy in the United States. (Cornelius Kruse, 149)

6. Current Trends

Personalists in North America carry on a vibrant philosophical discussion. They are developing, modifying, and challenging concepts and themes central to 20^th century Personalism. They include Richard C. Bayer at Fordham University, drawing on Catholic social thought and affirming the dignity of persons, focuses on personal development and a modified market economy. Patrick Grant at University of Victoria, British Columbia, outlines a Personalism approach appropriate for a post-modern and post-Marxist cultural phase. Thomas R. Rourke at Clarion University and Rosita A. Chazarreta Rourke at Duquesne University, heavily influenced by Mounier, Dorothy Day and the Catholic Worker movement, defend Personalism as an alternative to liberal capitalist and socialism. Erazim Kohak (1933-), drawing on the early work of Edmund Husserl (1859-1938) and Max Scheler (1874-1928), developed a personalistic view of nature. John Howie (1929-2000) developed an environmental ethics along personalist lines. Randall Auxier (1961-), editor of Library of Living Philosophers, writes on Brightman, Hartshorne, Royce, and Whitehead and is rethinking time, a category central to Brightman’s thought. Doug Anderson writes on Pierce and American philosophy. Currently, the center of studies in Personalism is in the department of philosophy of South Illinois University, where it is taught in the American philosophy program. Rufus Burrow, Jr. writes on African Personalism, particularly Martin Luther King, Jr. Thomas O. Buford founded and edited The Personalist Forum, now The Pluralist, and writes in education, epistemology, American Personalism, and philosophy of culture. Also, he and Charles Conti of University of Sussex Brighton England formed The International Forum on Persons in 1988. It holds biennial meetings alternating between North American and Europe. Alternating with the international meetings, Jim McLachlin holds a week-long summer conference on Personalism at Western Carolina University in the mountains of North Carolina.

7. References and Further Reading

Auxier, Randall E. Hartshorne and Brightman on God, Process, and Persons: TheCorrespondence, 1922-1945. Nashville, TN: Vanderbilt University Press, 2001.
Bengtsson, Jan Olof. The Worldview of Personalism, Origins and Early Development. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Bertocci, Peter A. Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion. New York, NY: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1951.
Bertocci, Peter A, and Richard M. Millard. Personality and the Good. New York, NY: David McKay, Co., 1963.
Blau, Joseph L. Men and Movements in American Philosophy. New York, NY: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1955.
Bertocci, Peter A. “Why Personalistic Idealism?” Idealistic Studies. 10, no. 3 (1980): 181-198.
Boethius, Liber de Persona et Duabus Naturis. Rome: Tuguri, 1571.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Metaphysics. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1882.
Bowne, Borden Parker. A Theory of Thought and Knowledge. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1987.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Principles of Ethics. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1892
Bowne, Borden Parker. Personalism. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin Company, 1908.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Kant and Spencer, a Critical Exposition. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin, 1912.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. An Introduction to Philosophy. New York, NY: Henry Holt and Co., Inc, 1925.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. Moral Laws. New York, NY: Abingdon Press, 1933.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. A Philosophy of Religion. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1940.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. Person and Reality. Edited by Peter A. Bertocci with Janette E. Newhall and Robert S. Brightman. New York, NY: Ronald Press, 1958.
Buford, Thomas O. Trust, Our Second Nature; Crisis, Reconciliation, and the Personal. Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books, 2008.
Buford, Thomas O. Self-Knowledge, An Essay in Social Personalism. Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books, 2011.
Buford, Thomas O., and Harold H. Oliver, eds. Personalism Revisited, Its Proponentsand Critics. New York, NY: Rodopi, 2002.
Buford, Thomas O. In Search of a Calling, The College’s Role in Shaping Identity. Macon, GA: Mercer University Press, 1995.
Burrows, Rufus R. Personalism, a Critical Introduction. St. Louis, MO: The Chalice Press, 1999.
Buckham, J. W., and G. M. Stratton, eds. George Holmes Howison, Philosopher andTeacher. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1934.
Calkins, Mary W. The Persistent Problems of Philosophy. New York, NY: The Macmillan Company, 1910.
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Author Information

Thomas O. Buford
Email: tom.buford@furman.edu
Furman University
U. S. A.

Individualism in Classical Chinese Thought

“Individualism” is used here to denote inborn and inalienable prerogatives, powers, or values associated with the self and person as found throughout much of the Chinese philosophical tradition. Unlike individualism in modern European and American contexts, Chinese manifestations of “individualism” do not stress an individual’s separation, total independence, and uniqueness from external authorities of power. Rather, individualism in the Chinese tradition emphasizes one’s power from within the context of one’s connection and unity (or harmony) with external authorities of power. So while both the modern Western and Chinese contexts share a belief that individuals are morally valuable and may attain an outstanding status as such, the Western tradition tends to view the individual in an atomized, disconnected manner, whereas the Chinese tradition focuses on the individual as a vitally integrated element within a larger familial, social, political, and cosmic whole. Chinese thinkers frequently address issues related to individual value, empowerment, authority, control, creativity, and self-determination, yet they package these crucial aspects of individualism in ways that are generally different from the way individualism has been packaged in the West.

Since the term is not indigenous to China, there is a general scholarly dispute about the relevance and appropriateness of applying the term “individualism” to Chinese philosophy. The inability of mainstream scholarship and discourse to locate and come to terms with native forms of individualism in China has had important ramifications for scholarship, politics, and international relations as well. For example, the current debate about universal human rights is founded on beliefs that individuals can lay claim to certain prerogatives simply by virtue of their existence as individuals. Some Asian polities have used the argument that Asian traditions are not individualistic in order to claim that human rights discourse is not only not universal in scope, but that it is also incompatible with traditional Asian values.

Dispute over “Individualism” in Chinese Philosophy
The Concept of Autonomy in Chinese Individualism
The Self as Individual
Individualism in Classical Confucian Thought
Moral Autonomy in the Mohist Writings
Individualism in the Zhuangzi
Individualism in the Thought of Yang Zhu
References and Further Reading

1. Dispute over “Individualism” in Chinese Philosophy

Scholars of early Chinese thought such as Chad Hansen, Henry Rosemont, and Michael Nylan have often considered the term “individualism” to be irrelevant or inappropriate for studying Chinese culture and history. Popular perceptions also tend to view Chinese culture as characterized by obligation and duty rather than by individual freedoms. This characterization of Chinese culture as group-oriented rather than individual-oriented helps promote the notion that individualism, especially as it is perceived – as a doctrine that protects individual autonomy against obligations stemming from external, familial or social institutions – is inappropriate for the Chinese context.

Other scholars such as Yu Ying-shih, Donald Munro, Erica Brindley, and Irene Bloom accept the concept of individualism as relevant for the Chinese tradition, at least as a point of discussion. Brindley goes the farthest to contend that by denying individualism in Chinese thought, one effectively ignores the multiple ways in which goals and values for the individual are in fact underscored in the tradition. While Brindley, Yu, and perhaps Bloom readily concede that the term “individualism” stems historically from European and American contexts, they generally agree that this need not limit the term’s usefulness as a tool for understanding concepts relating to the value and powers of the individual in China. For, even in the West, there is no single definition of the term “individual” that has escaped scholarly and public challenge and contestation. Nor does “individualism” always strictly connote one’s uniqueness, separation, and distinction, even in Western usages. Furthermore, the lack of a term or even explicit debate over doctrines of the individual, free will, or autonomy does not mean that Chinese thinkers or even ordinary Chinese people did not imply such things in their writings, or experience them in their lives. Making use of such arguments, scholars of this persuasion therefore assert that one can apply “individualism” to Chinese philosophy to gain rich comparative insights and shed light upon the importance of the integrated individual in Chinese philosophy.

The following analysis of texts and their embedded assumptions and claims serves to draw out possible Chinese forms of individualism that appear to differ considerably from Western forms of possessive individualism, which arose specifically in seventeenth-century English contexts. The latter forms focus on an individual’s possessive claims to uniqueness, and autonomy from surroundings. Chinese forms of individualism, on the contrary, tend to stress an individual’s achievement or fulfillment of some potential from within and in terms of a larger familial, social, and cosmic whole. This concept of individualism does not support a strong sense of autonomy and independence as defined through separation or freedom from others, but rather it reveals the autonomy and independence of the individual as a fully attained and integrated being within a larger web of relationships and authorities.

2. The Concept of Autonomy in Chinese Individualism

The notion of autonomy arguably serves as a distinguishing aspect of any form of individualism. The autonomous agent in many Western discursive models is free from certain external influences. This can be seen in the fact that various individualisms of today generally recast the individual as someone with the potential to be separate and different from his environment and conventional norms. They empower individuals by emphasizing their ability to make decisions and judgments independent of mundane influences and norms in the world.

Early Chinese forms of individualism, on the contrary, do not generally focus on the radical autonomy of the individual; but rather on the holistic integration of the individual with forces and authorities in his or her surroundings (family, society, and cosmos). For early Chinese thinkers, there is no such thing as unfettered autonomy or freedom of will. Rather, early Chinese thinkers posit the existence of a relative and relational sort of autonomy; or, a type of autonomy that grants individuals the freedom to make decisions for themselves, and to shape the course of their own lives to the fullest degree that they can—all from within an intricate system of interrelationships. This type of autonomy grants authority to the individual to fulfill his or her potentials as an integrated individual. The goal of such an individual is to achieve authoritativeness as a person while at the same time duly negotiating influences, commands, and responsibilities that stem from his or her larger environment. Therefore, a crucial back-and-forth tug between the self and the various authorities surrounding it is woven into the very fabric of what it means to be a fully attained, authoritative, empowered, and integrated individual.

3. The Self as Individual

Free from the radical dichotomy between truth/essence and appearance that is characterized by Descartes, the early Chinese “self” is not encumbered by a gross split between mind and body, or between true nature and experience. Rather, the early Chinese “self” is more akin to an organism, which both consists in and emerges out of complex processes occurring inside and outside of it as it interacts with and relates to his or her environment. In such a way, the concepts of self and person are much more integrated than in certain, extreme dualistic Western traditions, as stand in constant and ever-changing relationship to what occurs both within and without.

To the extent that the self is conceived as physical, embodied, and dynamic, the early Chinese “self” necessarily entails a different definition of “individual.” While there is no clear term in Classical Chinese that might translate consistently into “individual,” this latter term facilitates discussion of those aspects of the self that emphasize its particularity within a whole. We use the term “individual” here to refer to early Chinese notions of self that concern not so much the subjective, psychological sense of “self,” but the qualities of a person that mark him or her as a single, particular entity capable of exerting agency from within a web of relationships. In other words, we refer to the individual not as an atomistic, isolated, and undifferentiated part of a whole, but as a distinct organism that must serve particular functions and fulfill a unique set of relationships in the worlds of which he or she is a part. The individual is thus a unique participant in a larger whole—integral to both, the processes that define the whole, as well as to the change and transformation that stems from itself.

4. Individualism in Classical Confucian Thought

One of the abiding concepts in Chinese philosophy, irrespective of the school of thought, is that of self-cultivation. The Ru, or Confucian lineage, places a premium on the moral cultivation of the individual using a variety of tools and resources, both internal and external. In the Analects of Confucius, the junzi (gentleman, or nobleman) constitutes the most important ideal for the individual, and any person who strives for such an ideal is to do so by a complicated moral regimen of intense involvement with the rites of the Zhou (dynastic house) and its music; moral education through a morally achieved ruler, master or moral exemplar; and training—involving texts and histories as well as personal resources such as will-power, moral desire, inward reflection and thought, and the active appraisal of how one’s own thoughts and actions compare to those of others.

While one may not wish to call anything mentioned in the Analects “individualism,” it is clear that the individual holds the most valuable key insofar as he or she serves as the locus for self-cultivation and, hence, for the transformation of himself or herself to contribute to a moral society and cosmos. The individual forms the basis upon which authoritative, moral meaning and behavior is to be constructed. Insofar as the individual is considered to be the fundamental site of moral transformation, it is an absolutely crucial element of Confucian thought. So, while the philosophy represented by the Analects does not promote individualism as a moral stance that stresses individual autonomy and freedom from social constraints, it does establish the individual as inherently valuable in the process of moral cultivation, with the potential to be authoritative and fully integrated as a junzi figure within a web of intricate social, political, and cosmic forces. Thus, a type of integrated individualism seems to exist even in the most basic of early Chinese Confucian texts.

The figure whose writings provide us with one of the earliest, and perhaps clearest, representations of early Chinese individualism is Mencius. In the literature prior to Mencius, the individual represents a foundational site for moral cultivation, but the source of one’s moral motivation and insight may stem largely from external authorities. Mencius changes this by appealing to the innate moral agencies of the individual through the concept of xing, (human nature). By naturalizing moral motivation through the concept of xing, Mencius reveals what appears to be a new orientation towards human agency: one that sees the individual body as a universal source of cosmic authority and natural patterns.

Mencius defines sources of moral agency and authority by outlining an internal-external dichotomy and emphasizing the internal resources of the individual in moral cultivation. This is best demonstrated in Mencius 2A2 and the entire Chapter Six, Part A of the text, where Mencius debates with an opponent, Gaozi, over the idea that xing is a source of moral agency and insight. Unlike Mencius, Gaozi advocates the total subordination of the human heart-mind, the seat of a person’s controlling mechanism, the will (zhi), to yan, or what might be translated in the passage as “sayings,” or “teachings.” In such a way, Gaozi declares the absolute necessity of study and discipline through tradition, culture, and other external inputs. Mencius counters this by showing the necessity of stilling one’s heart-mind so that it will allow for its natural, innate moral tendencies to guide the body in correct thinking and behavior.

In another famous debate, Gaozi compares moral refinement to cups and saucers, which have been constructed by man through hard work and external imprinting. His view of moral cultivation strongly denies that an individual’s internal xing could have any moral quality or potential. Mencius responds with an analogy of equal force, describing human xing in terms of water. Just as the flow of water naturally tends downward, he claims, so does human xing naturally move toward goodness. Denouncing Gaozi’s views on the external origins of morality, Mencius insists that only when internal resources such as xing are obstructed, violated, and destroyed through external forces, does immoral behavior arise.

Mencius’ claims integrate the moral motivation of xing with life processes associated with the human body. Taking advantage of a linguistic connection between the terms for “life” and “human nature” in classical Chinese, Mencius argues that the moral agency of xing is intrinsic to basic life processes. To him, moral motivation, rooted in human nature, is inextricably tied to the agency that fills our very lives with health and vitality.

In sum, to Mencius, each individual person is his or her own moral agent by virtue of living properly and healthfully as a human being. By locating the seeds of morality in xing, one’s Heaven-endowed agency for human life, Mencius demonstrates that cultivating oneself morally is tantamount to attaining the proper measures for the basic vital functions of human beings. Mencius therefore not only naturalizes moral agency by making it a universally inherent trait in every individual, he also proposes a radical, physiological claim for a type of individualism that connects proper moral cultivation to the natural growth of one’s inherent xing and life forces.

Mencius is important in the history of Chinese individualism because he grounds ultimate moral authority in the inner, innate resources of the individual. What characterizes Mencius’ form of individualism as a stronger form of individualism than that outlined in the Analects is its emphasis on the human body not merely as a medium of authority or primary locus for the attainment of idealized authority (as exemplified through self-cultivation), but as an individualized source of it as well.

It is noteworthy that all Confucians who postdate Mencius seem to understand xing in terms of powerful, innate tendencies of individuals, but some, like Xunzi, fought vigorously to deny that such tendencies were morally positive. While Xunzi may not be called an individualist in the sense that Mencius may, his thought nonetheless supports a strong notion of individual moral autonomy as represented in the Analects.

5. Moral Autonomy in the Mohist Writings

The early Mohists were famous for their views in social conformity and obedience to political authorities, such as rulers and the Son of Heaven, who abided by the authority of Heaven. There is little that is individualistic about such conformist ideals in a Western sense. However, when one considers that the basis of their views on moral meritocracy and Heaven’s Will are grounded on a fundamental belief in an individual’s rational capacity to know and learn about morality, then the Mohist individual starts to appear much more individualistic than he would at first glance. Indeed, in early Mohist writings, individuals are required to know and choose the morally correct path – that which conforms with Heaven’s Will – on their own. They are thus morally autonomous in two senses: (1) They have the ability to use their rational minds to decipher, come to know, or (in the case of unexceptional commoners and people) at least be tacitly familiar with Heaven’s Will, and (2) They have the ability to choose to conform with what is right.

The early Mohists, who argue explicitly against contemporary beliefs in ming (fate, destiny, derived from Heaven), grant the individual a high degree of control over outcomes in this world. So while the early Mohists do not place extra value or emphasis on the individual or its powers and prerogatives, much less on its self-cultivation, they implicitly grant the individual much agency and control over the course of its life and the type of moral path it wishes to follow. Through their writings one gains insights into the ways in which concepts like conformity may actually go hand-in-hand with beliefs in autonomy and free will.

6. Individualism in the Zhuangzi

The Inner Chapters of the Zhuangzi, generally considered by scholars to have been written by Zhuangzi (or Zhuang Zhou), promote a vision of the individual’s unity with the Dao of Heaven. Whether such a vision is individualistic or not is open to debate. On the one hand Zhuangzi does not explicitly attribute the processes of the Dao to powers inherent in an individual’s body or spirit. Therefore, his writings do not technically fall under the definition of “individualism,” used above when discussing Mencius, which locates the primary source of idealized agency within the mundane individual. In fact, Zhuangzi openly advocates the notion of losing one’s self-identity and sense of self or body in order to fully embrace the agency of Dao. This appears to go against any kind of individualism that might place value on the self.

On the other hand, however, Zhuangzi hopes that every individual might achieve a transcendent self, along with a freedom associated with the transcendent individual. Such freedom – spiritual in nature – is not freedom from a higher source of power, but freedom through it. Insofar as Zhuangzi promotes an ideal of spiritual freedom through individual self-cultivation, his thought is characteristic of the holistic individualism described previously. Individuals are not valued in and of themselves but through their connection with a higher authority or power. Realized individuals – the goal in Zhuangzian thought – are not unique, autonomous individuals who stand apart from external powers, but unique manifestations of the workings of a shared Dao.

The so-called “Primitivist,” whose writings in the Outer Chapters of the Zhuangzi seem to represent a coherent voice in that text, presents a form of individualism more akin to that described in the Mencius above. Whereas the Inner Chapters expound on a philosophy whose goals appear compatible with individualistic goals, this strand of the Outer Chapters goes further to locate value inside the individual from the beginning, even in an individual’s mundane state.

The primitivist writings uniquely emphasize the idealized powers of xing in every individual, which ultimately link a person with the Dao. Using a strong language of internal-external, the Primitivist denounces morality as an external overlay and unnecessary pollution of internal xing. By recommending that each individual place all of his or her faith in the natural, innate powers of xing, the Primitivist suggests that one can rid oneself of impulses responsible for the creation of cultural and social norms. This results in the reversion of the individual not just back to his or her most basic nature – one that is not coincidentally in accordance with the Dao of the natural world – but a reversion of society to an era of primitive political structures and human interactions as well.

By rejecting the necessity of social structures, institutions, knowledge, technologies, and cultural practices in favor of a cosmic or natural law and power that is accessible through the individual, human body, the proponents of the primitivist ideology share a basic individualistic point of view. Such a view assumes that ultimate value lies in what humans possess innately and in what is naturally accessible to every individual. For the Primitivist, this internal, innate, and universal human agency to interact ideally in the world derives from xing, which is ultimately a part of the natural cycles of the cosmic Dao.

The Primitivist illuminates polarities between what is external and alien or internal and inalienable to a given object. In such a manner he pits knowledge and culture in society against an individual’s personal vitality and innate powers. This naturalizes what is ideal by locating it in the cosmic capacity and authority of an individual’s xing. In the Laozi, a text upon which the Primitivist writing heavily relies, the ruler serves as the main conduit that enables everyone’s individual access to the Dao. Unlike the Laozi, the Primitivist presents a utopian vision that speaks to every individual’s direct, bodily relationship to cosmic power. This difference points to a noteworthy distinction between theocratic conceptualizations of cosmic authority and power as expressed in the Laozi; and biocratic, individualized ones as expressed in the Primitivist ideal.

7. Individualism in the Thought of Yang Zhu

One cannot speak of individualistic movements in early China without at least coming to terms with what we know about Yang Zhu, or Yangzi (c. 4^th century B.C.E.), and his legacy. Mencius claimed that Yang Zhu promoted a doctrine of egoism, which the former deemed tantamount to anarchism. Though there is no solid evidence that anything Yangzi may have authored has been transmitted through the ages, we can still gain insight into his views from descriptions and condemnations of his teachings by Mencius and other writers of the slightly later Han period. It is possible that what we have described as primitivist above is nothing more than a strain of thought influenced by Yangist tenets and beliefs.

Yang Zhu, like Mencius, appears to have viewed the self and human body as an important resource for universal, objective forms of authority through xing. We see this through the following quote from Mencius, which states: “Even if he were to benefit the world by pulling out a single hair, he would not do it.” It appears that Yangzi’s so-called egoism is founded on a principle of preserving some aspect of one’s self or body over and above anything else. A later author claims that what Yangzi valued was self in and of itself, while others described his thinking in the following way: “Keeping one’s nature whole, preserving one’s genuineness, and not letting things tire one’s form (body) – these Yangzi advocated but Mencius denounced.” In this example, the self to be valued consists in xing, the body, and in “genuineness” – a vague concept that seems to refer to a spiritual ideal – inherent or original to the individual. Based on such a description, Yang Zhu appears to have idealized certain aspects of the self that help define its essence, whether material, spiritual, or both. By insisting on a sharp separation between that which is internal or associated with the person on the one hand, and external things that might tire it on the other, Yang Zhu joins Mencius in basing his ideals on a fundamental inner/outer distinction. However, his recommendation that one keep the self and its aspects free of outside contamination, if accurate, would constitute an even more extreme form of individualism than what we have encountered with Mencius.

Like Zhuangzi, Yang Zhu (as characterized by later texts that attribute a certain, relatively consistent perspective to his beliefs) seems to have supported the preservation of some essential and vital spirit that is ultimately related to the human body and its wholeness. Unlike Zhuangzi, who wishes for individuals to transcend their own awareness of the boundaries of the self and its materiality, Yang Zhu appears to glorify the existence of these, and to call for the preservation of a strict separation between what is inside and belonging to the sphere of the self, and what is outside and belonging to the sphere of things. Thus, the main distinction between Zhuangzi and Yang Zhu lies in the fact that Yang Zhu appears to value the self as a material body that is sacred precisely because of its essential materiality and life-producing qualities. Zhuangzi, on the other hand, does not directly embrace the cult of bodily vitality. He calls for individuals to transcend their bodies and their materiality so as to embrace what he sometimes refers to as the spirit of the Dao, which should be understood as an ethereal type of vitality.

Given these descriptions of Yang Zhu’s thought, it seems fair to call him an individualist rather than an apologist for selfish egoism. After all, there is no convincing evidence that Yang Zhu promoted selfishness in the sense that he inspired individuals to seek self-profit through the exploitation of public resources or goods. Moreover, there is no clear indication that Yang Zhu tacitly condoned harming or destroying society through his ideals. Rather, most of the reliable evidence points to the fact that Yang Zhu redefined what it meant to value the self in terms of one’s personal, material-spiritual salvation. Indeed, Yang Zhu was perhaps one of the first thinkers, like Mencius, to see xing and the self as a primary source of idealized individual agency and meaning.

Individualism, as has been introduced here, was a broad orientation in early Chinese thought that posited the value and autonomy of the individual and, in some instances, located sources of idealized cosmic power and authority within the individual body. Widespread notions of self-cultivation viewed the individual as the key site of moral or spiritual transformation and, hence, the individual was the primary medium for assimilating social and cosmic authority and order. Early Chinese thinkers also presumed the moral or spiritual autonomy of the individual, granting individuals the power to effect changes in their lives and make important choices concerning morality, self-cultivation, and conformity to external sources of authority. Individualistic authors like Mencius, the Primitivist, and possibly Yang Zhu, went so far as to naturalize cosmic or divine sources of authority in the world by locating them within the human body itself. They thereby made the individual body the primary source for idealized agencies, and valued one’s cultivation of such innate agencies as the highest good.

8. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger, and David L. Hall. “The Problematic of Self in Western Thought,” Thinking from the Han: Self, Truth, and Transcendence in Chinese and Western Culture. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1998.
Ames, Roger, Wimal Dissanayake, and Thomas Kasulis, ed. Self as Person in Asian Theory and Practice. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1994.
Ames, Roger, Wimal Dissanayake, and Thomas Kasulis, ed. Self as Image in Asian Theory and Practice. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1998.
Angle, Stephen. Human Rights in Chinese Thought: A Cross-Cultural Inquiry. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
Bauer, Joanne and Daniel Bell, eds. The East Asian Challenge for Human Rights. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Bloom, Irene eds. “Confucian Perspectives on the Individual and the Collective,” Religious Diversity and Human Rights, Irene Bloom, J. Paul Martin, and Wayne L. Proudfoot, 114-151. New York: Columbia University Press, 1996.
Brindley, Erica. Individualism in Early China: Human Agency and the Self in Thought and Politics. University of Hawaii Press, 2010.
Chan, Joseph. “Moral Autonomy, Civil Liberties, and Confucianism,” Philosophy East and West, 52.3 (2002): 281-310.
Chen, Albert H. Y. “Is Confucianism Compatible with Liberal Constitutional Democracy?” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 35.2 (June 2007): 195-216.
Csikszentmihalyi, Mark. Material Virtue: Ethics and the Body in Early China. Leiden: Brill, 2004.
Emerson, John. “Yang Chu’s Discovery of the Body,” Philosophy East and West. 46.4 (1996): 533-566.
Graham, Angus C. Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China. La Salle, IL: Open Court, 1989.
Graham, Angus C. “The Background of the Mencian Theory of Human Nature,” Tsing Hua Journal of Chinese Studies, vol. 6 (1957): pp. 215-271.
Greenwood, John. “Individualism and Collectivism in Moral and Social Thought,” The Moral Circle and the Self: Chinese and Western Approaches, eds., Kim-chong Chong, Sor-hoon Tan, and C. L. Ten, 163-73. La Salle, IL: Open Court, 2003.
Hansen, Chad. “Individualism in Chinese Thought,” Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald Munro, 35-55. Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985.
Ivanhoe, P. J. Confucian Moral Self Cultivation. New York: Peter Lang, 1993.
Kline, T. C. III and P. J. Ivanhoe, eds. Virtue, Nature, and Moral Agency in the Xunzi. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, Inc., 2000.
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Author Information

Erica Brindley
Email: efb12@psu.edu
The Pennsylvania State University
U. S. A.

Supervenience and Mind

This article is an informal introduction to the concept of supervenience and the role it plays in the philosophy of mind. It surveys some of the many ways the concept has been used to reveal the manner and degree to which mental phenomena depend on facts about our bodies and their physical features. Philosophers usually construe the supervenience relation as a relation between classes of properties, where a class of properties, F, supervenes on a class of properties, G, just in case there is no difference in F-properties without some difference in G-properties. As David Lewis puts it, “no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” (1986, p. 14). It is in the philosophy of mind that we find the term’s most frequent contemporary occurrence.

The goal of asking whether one set of properties supervenes on another is to better understand the ontological relation between the two sets — especially, whether the one set of properties depends entirely on the other. Suppose, for example, that two individuals can have different moral properties while being exactly alike in terms of their actual and potential behavior; that is, suppose that one’s moral features do not supervene on one’s behavioral features. Then we can conclude that the former depend on something more than the latter. And if we accept this conclusion, we are then led to search for a set of properties on which our moral features do supervene, a set of properties in terms of which any two individuals must differ with any moral difference. The goal is to isolate just that set of features on which our moral properties do wholly rely.

Suppose we succeed in identifying a set of features on which F-properties supervene (where F-properties might be moral, mental, aesthetic, economic, or any other higher-level properties). Then we can try to discover the nature of the dependence of F-properties on the underlying G-properties (for example, behavioral, physical, neurological, or intrinsic) by asking about the manner in which the former supervene on the latter. Is it a logical truth that a difference in F-properties requires a difference in G-properties? Is this covariance due to the causal laws that actually obtain? Is it a matter of metaphysical necessity? Asking these questions about the way in which F-properties supervene may help us decide whether the dependence is, for example, a wholly analytic affair, a type of causal dependence, a matter of constitution, or a matter of genuine identity.

Supervenience: The Basic Idea
Supervenience and Non-Reductive Physicalism
Varieties of Supervenience
1. Global and Local Versions
2. Varieties of Necessitation
Two Common Complaints with Supervenience Theses
1. Explanatory Failure
2. Ontological Failure
Concluding Remarks
References and Further Readings

1. Supervenience: The Basic Idea

Nora’s latest sculpture has many intrinsic features, including its shape, density, texture, and constituent matter. It also has various aesthetic properties — beauty, grace, elegance, and expressive power. No doubt, the aesthetic properties of the sculpture are in some way and to some degree a result of its intrinsic features. But in what way exactly, and to what degree? Thinking in terms of supervenience is a good start to finding the answer. Imagine an artwork, x*, that is intrinsically indistinguishable from Nora’s sculpture, x — a perfect duplicate of x. Is it possible that despite the indiscernability, x* might differ aesthetically from x? If it is not possible for x and the intrinsically indiscernable x* to differ aesthetically, then we say that the object’s aesthetic features supervene on its intrinsic features, where a class of properties, F, supervenes on a class of properties, G, just in case a difference in F-properties requires a difference in G-properties; in other words, all the same G-properties guarantee all the same F-properties.

If we decide that the object’s aesthetic properties do supervene on its intrinsic features, then we are led to inquire whether the former are identical with the latter or whether the dependence relation is of some weaker sort — for example, causal dependence or constitution. On the other hand, if we conclude that the object’s aesthetic properties do not supervene on its intrinsic features, that is, if x* might differ aesthetically from x despite their intrinsic similarity, then we can conclude that those aesthetic properties are at least partly a function of certain relations the object bears to external items. We are then led to ask what the relevant external relations are. We think in terms of supervenience again, imagining various changes in x’s environment (different origins, differences in historical context, different standards of the qualified judges, differences in popular opinion), and for each of those changes we decide whether x’s aesthetic features might also differ, until we isolate just those features of the environment on which the aesthetic properties do rely. The conclusion would then be that the object’s aesthetic features supervene on its intrinsic properties together with those external features.

As this line of inquiry shows, the concept of supervenience is an invaluable tool for deciding whether and how one set of properties depends on another. An analogous line of inquiry is found in discussions of mental content. The content of one’s mental states depends largely on what the individual is like internally — on the state of the brain and the brain’s causal relations to other parts of the body, including sense organs and limbs. But does the content of one’s mental states depend entirely on these intrinsic features? To decide this issue, we consider whether it is possible for an indistinguishable individual, a molecule-for-molecule duplicate, to differ in terms of the content of her mental states. And thanks to the thought experiments of Hilary Putnam (1973, 1975) and Tyler Burge (1979), it is widely thought that intrinsic duplicates can indeed differ in the content of their mental states. Putnam has us imagine a twin-earth that is exactly like earth except that what they call “water” on twin-earth is comprised of something other than H₂O molecules. The content of your water-thoughts, it seems, differs from the content of your doppelganger’s “water”-thoughts on twin-earth — simply because of the difference in the liquid toward which those thoughts are directed. (But note that Putnam’s example is actually designed to show a difference in linguistic content, meaning, which does not in itself entail a difference in mental content.) Likewise, Burge shows that given suitable differences in surrounding linguistic practice, the thoughts one expresses with the word ‘arthritis’ might differ in content from those that one’s doppelganger expresses. For example, if your duplicate inhabits a possible world in which ‘arthritis’ is regularly used to describe various conditions in addition to inflammation of the joints, then it seems that the content of the duplicate’s ‘arthritis’ thoughts will differ from yours. Examples such as these seem to show that the content of one’s mental states does not supervene on one’s intrinsic features alone, but only on a set of features that includes features of one’s environment.

While Putnam and Burge do not use the term ‘supervenience’ in the essays mentioned above (though Burge does use it in his 1986 discussion of externalism), it is clear that the concept of “no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” is being utilized. It was Davidson’s use of ‘supervenience’ in “Mental Events” (1970) that made the term popular in the philosophy of mind.

2. Supervenience and Non-Reductive Physicalism

While Davidson denies that there are psychophysical laws, he acknowledges (in a widely cited passage) that

mental characteristics are in some sense dependent, or supervenient, on physical characteristics. Such supervenience might be taken to mean that there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respect, or that an object cannot alter in some mental respect without altering in some physical respect” (1970, p. 88).

Not long after the appearance of Davidson’s essay, discussions of Non-Reductive Physicalism became the major locus of supervenience-talk in the philosophy of mind and the philosophical literature in general. Due to the popularity of functionalist accounts of mentality and the wide degree of multiple realizability they entail (that is, that the same mental property can be realized by events of different physical, chemical, and neural types), a dominant view in the philosophy of mind for the past few decades is the belief that mental properties are not identical with neural properties or any other properties of the natural sciences. Yet, many of those who reject psychophysical property-identities also claim to support Physicalism regarding mentality, the view that all mental phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. One wonders: how can mentality obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena, as Physicalism maintains, if mental properties are not physical? The most popular answer is that while mental properties are not identical with physical properties, they nonetheless depend on nothing other than physical properties — that is, they supervene on physical properties.

Whether a mental-physical supervenience thesis captures the content of Physicalism regarding mentality depends on how exactly the supervenience relation is to be understood. To say that there is no mental difference without some physical difference leaves the matter rather unclear. Much of the literature on supervenience in the philosophy of mind is devoted to adding the needed precision. Let us consider some of the many issues that arise.

3. Varieties of Supervenience

The philosophical literature is replete with all manner of ways to describe the supervenience relation — “an unlovely proliferation,” as Lewis puts it (1986, p. 14). Here are some of the most popular brands.

a. Global and Local Versions

John Haugeland expresses the idea that all properties supervene on physical properties as follows: “[t]he world could not have been different in any respect, without having been different in some strictly physical respect” (1984, p. 1). This is a global supervenience thesis, claiming that nonphysical difference entails physical difference at the level of possible worlds as a whole (where a possible world is a way the world could have been, which includes the actual world, the way the world actually is). Applied to mental and physical properties, Haugeland’s global supervenience claim is that the total state of any possible world could not have been any different mentally without differing physically. That is,

(GS) for any possible worlds, w₁ and w₂, if w₁ and w₂ differ mentally, then w₁ and w₂ differ physically.

Equivalently, if w₁ and w₂ are exactly the same physically, then they are exactly the same mentally.

While GS goes a long way toward capturing the physicalist belief that the mental depends entirely on the physical, it is arguable that it does not go far enough. Kim (1987, p. 321) has us imagine that some possible world b differs physically from the actual world in only the following respect: in b one of Saturn’s rings contains an additional ammonia molecule. GS requires mental similarity only between worlds that are physically indistinguishable as a whole. So despite the slight and innocuous physical difference between b and the actual world, GS allows that b mentally differs from the actual world as greatly as you please, perhaps being completely devoid of mentality. This result clearly goes against the physicalist intuition that mental phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. For in the case Kim describes, all of the physical features that are relevant to mentality remain constant. So it seems that if b differs mentally from the actual world, as GS allows, then whatever mental differences there are would have to be due to something other than physical differences. (Note that several authors identify and formulate different types of global supervenience; for a thorough description of varieties of global supervenience, see McLaughlin and Bennett, 2006. These complexities are ignored in this introductory survey; here the concern is with global supervenience in general.)

To come closer to capturing the content of Physicalism regarding the mind, a supervenience thesis needs to require not only that worlds differing mentally differ physically, but also that individual objects and events cannot differ mentally without differing physically. Consider, then, the following local supervenience thesis:

(LS) for any worlds, w₁ and w₂, and any individuals, x in w₁ and y in w₂, if x in w₁ differs mentally from y in w₂, then x in w₁ differs physically from y in w₂.

Or one might choose what Kim (1984) calls “strong” supervenience. To say that mental properties strongly supervene on physical properties is to say that

(SS) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that x has P, and necessarily, for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M.

The difference between LS and SS is that LS allows the possibility that some entities have mental properties without having any physical properties. (Yet, SS and LS are equivalent when the base set of physical properties is closed under negation, that is, when for every physical property P in the base set, its negation, ~P, is also included.)

Now suppose that Carla and Marla inhabit worlds that are physically indistinguishable in every respect except for the extra ammonia molecule in a ring of Saturn. While the worlds themselves differ physically, Carla and Marla do not. So unlike GS, LS and SS entail that Carla and Marla are mentally indistinguishable. So it seems that LS and SS better capture the physicalist intuition that mental facts obtain solely in virtue of physical facts. (However, there is some debate over whether the global thesis might actually be equivalent to SS given the right closure principles. See, for example, Petrie, 1987, Kim, 1987, Paull & Sider, 1992, and Stalnaker, 1996.)

Note that SS differs from Kim’s formulation of what he calls “weak” supervenience (WS), which lacks the second occurrence of the word ‘necessarily.’

(WS) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that x has P, and for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M.

Unlike SS and LS, WS requires only that physical duplicates are mental duplicates within possible worlds, thereby allowing that physical duplicates differ mentally across possible worlds. So unlike SS and LS, WS allows that you could have had different mental properties from those you actually have without differing in any physical way. But if you could have had different mental properties without differing physically in any way, then the mental facts about you do not depend solely on the way you are physically, which seems to be contrary to Physicalism. Thus, SS and LS are preferable to WS.

As indicated above, by not allowing that Carla and Marla differ mentally, LS and SS might seem preferable to GS. However, one might think that given externalist intuitions, GS is more desirable. If externalism regarding mental content is correct, then individuals that are the same in terms of their intrinsic physical properties are not guaranteed to be mentally the same. GS honors externalist intuitions by requiring sameness only at the level of whole worlds, thereby allowing individuals with all the same intrinsic physical properties to differ mentally. However, Kim (1987, pp. 322-4) points out that the strong supervenience thesis, SS, can also allow the truth of externalism simply by including extrinsic properties of individuals in the supervenience base, properties such as being causally related to stuff comprised of H₂O. If the underlying physical properties, the subvening properties, include relations to external items, then LS can also accommodate externalist intuitions. (Although, we cannot let just any extrinsic property into the supervenience base. If we allow the extrinsic feature of occupying a world with such-and-such complete physical profile, then the strong and local supervenience theses automatically collapse into the global version. For in that case, having all the same mental properties is not required unless the individuals occupy worlds that are physically indistinguishable in every respect. Vera Hoffmann and Albert Newen, 2007, develop the idea of property-dependent supervenience as a way to include only those extrinsic properties that are relevant to the instantiation of a higher-level property.)

We saw that one worry about GS is that it allows great mental differences to be accompanied by what seem to be wholly irrelevant physical differences — allowing, for example, that Carla and Marla differ mentally despite their physical similarity, simply because in Marla’s world there is one more ammonia molecule in one of the rings of Saturn. LS and SS prevent this possibility but they still fall short of fully capturing physicalist intuitions since differences irrelevant to one’s mentality are to be found not only in distant regions of space. Suppose that Carla and Marla live in physically indistinguishable environments and their bodies are physically indistinguishable in all but the following respect: Marla has an additional electron in one of her toenails. Since this cuticle difference seems to be completely irrelevant to mentality, we would expect that Carla and Marla are mentally indistinguishable. However, since they are not physically indistinguishable, LS and SS allow vast mental differences between the two. This result seems contrary to the spirit of Physicalism since Carla and Marla are physically indistinguishable in all the ways that are relevant to mentality.

The move from GS to LS and SS is an attempt to isolate those physical properties that are relevant to the exemplification of a mental property. For a more successful attempt, one might appeal to Terence Horgan’s regional supervenience thesis. With his notion of a P-region, a spatio-temporal region of a physically possible world, Horgan expresses his regional supervenience thesis as: “There are no two P-regions that are exactly alike in all qualitative intrinsic physical features but different in some other qualitative intrinsic feature” (1993a, p. 571). (Also see Horgan 1982, p. 37). Consider the region of space occupied by Marla’s whole body minus the toenail with the extra electron and the region of space occupied by the corresponding part of Carla’s body. Since these two regions are physically indistinguishable, the regional supervenience thesis yields the correct result that Carla-minus (Carla minus the toenail) does not differ mentally from Marla-minus. This result together with the fact that there is no mentality supervening on the physical features of the toenail itself yields that further desired conclusion that Marla as a whole is mentally the same as Carla as a whole. (By the way, those mental and other higher-order states that require an externalist individuation will supervene on the intrinsic features of an expanded region of space, which Horgan points out, is “a region large enough to encompass, as intrinsic features, all the contextually relevant facts”: 1982, p. 39.)

Another way to isolate just those physical features that are relevant to mentality is to utilize Kim’s notion of a B-minimal property. A property is B-minimal when “any property weaker than it is not a supervenience base” (1984, p. 165). If a physical property, P, is B-minimal with respect to mental property M, then P is a least sufficient condition for M — that is, P’s instantiation guarantees M’s instantiation, and there is no proper constituent of P an instance of which guarantees an instance of M. The properties that are B-minimal with respect to M do not include the number of electrons in one’s toenails. Thus, with only B-minimal properties in the supervenience base, Carla and Marla have all the same subvening properties despite their cuticle difference, which guarantees that they have all the same mental properties. Suppose, then, that we strengthen LS and SS to read:

(LS*) for any mental property M, there is a physical property P that is B-minimal with respect to M, such that for any possible worlds, w₁ and w₂, and any individuals x in w₁ and y in w₂, if x in w₁ differs from y in w₂ in terms of M, then x in w₁ differs from y in w₂ in terms of P

and

(SS*) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that (i) x has P, (ii) P is B-minimal with respect to M, and (ii) necessarily, for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M,

respectively. Since no physical property that is B-minimal property with respect to M includes having an extra electron in a toenail, neither LS* nor SS* allows that Carla and Marla differ mentally, which is just as Physicalism seems to require given that they are physically indistinguishable in all respects relevant to mentality.

Jeffrey Poland’s (1994) formulation of Physicalism further narrows the class of relevant base properties by adding the notion of a B-minimal property to a regional supervenience thesis. Poland worries that a physical property might qualify as a B-minimal supervenience base with respect to some higher-level (for example, mental) property without being the property by virtue of which the higher-level property is instantiated. To remedy this defect Poland proposes that “[f]or each non-physical attribute, N, and for each region of space-time, R, if N is actually (or possibly) instantiated in R, then there exists a minimal class of physically-based attributes, P, such that the instantiation of the members of P does (or would) provide a realization of N on that occasion” (p. 191).

Apart from deciding which of these supervenience theses to endorse, there is another issue that needs to be addressed. In formulating a supervenience thesis adequate for understanding the ontological relation between two sets of properties, we need to decide which brand of modality is to figure in our formulation? How should the necessity operators in WS, SS, and SS* be interpreted, and what is the range of the possible worlds mentioned in GS, LS, and LS*?

b. Varieties of Necessitation

Suppose it is true that whenever there is a mental difference there is a physical difference. It would seem that this is not merely an accidental fact, not merely a matter of the way things happen to be. Rather it seems that the physical facts that obtain in some way necessitate the mental facts that obtain:

(N) facts about the distribution of physical properties necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

But what brand of necessity is at issue here? Answering this modal question is essential to understanding how the mental depends on the physical. The answer is also crucial to deciding whether a supervenience thesis can adequately capture all that Physicalism regarding mentality entails.

The physical facts clearly do not logically necessitate the mental facts. The laws of logic alone do not allow us to derive the latter from the former. However, one might wonder whether the laws of logic together with the meanings of physical and mental terms allow us to derive all true mentalistic sentences from sentences expressed in physical vocabulary. That is, one might wonder whether

(N_L-C) facts about the distribution of physical properties logically/conceptually necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

Yet, N_L-C seems implausible on any reasonable interpretation of ‘physical.’ If we restrict the term ‘physical’ to properties described by the science of physics itself, then the obvious difference in meaning between mental vocabulary and the vocabulary of physics seems to show that N_L-C is false. Even if the word ‘physical’ were used loosely enough to include brain properties, and even if mental properties were identical with brain properties, N_L-C would still be highly dubious. Since mental talk is not synonymous with neural talk, mind-brain identity theorists rightly held their view, not as an analytic truth, but as a significant empirical hypothesis. (See, for example, J.J.C. Smart, 1959 and U.T. Place, 1956.) Suppose ‘physical’ is used liberally enough to include overt behavioral responses to environmental input — for example, bringing an umbrella when confronted with rain, grimacing and groaning as the punching continues, and responding appropriately in French to questions posed in French. With this liberal use of ‘physical’ N_L-C would be accepted by logical behaviorists. Of course, this is no credit to N_L-C given the well-known problems with logical behaviorism. Although, one might think that with such a generous use of ‘physical,’ analytic functionalism (which is not as implausible as logical behaviorism) is committed to N_L-C as well. But that is not so. Functionalists characterize mental properties in terms of their relations to environmental input, behavioral output, and other mental properties. For instance, the belief that it is raining will be characterized in terms of an inclination to bring an umbrella if one wishes to keep dry. Given that mental predicates are to be interdefined, even with a liberal definition of ‘physical’ the analytic functionalist would seem compelled to deny that a purely physical description logically/conceptually guarantees the truth of any mental description.

Not only does N_L-C seem to be false, it also appears to be much more than what Physicalism requires. It might be that mental phenomena depend entirely on physical phenomena (as physicalists regarding mentality contend) without there being a logical or conceptual tie between the two. Since predicates that differ in meaning might denote the very same property, it seems that even if mental properties were identical with physical properties, it would not follow that facts about the latter logically or conceptually guarantee facts about the former. (However, Robert Kirk claims otherwise. Imagine the complete set, P, of facts about the world expressed in the vocabulary of an ideal physics, and suppose that this set includes all of the physical laws that obtain. According to Kirk, Physicalism requires that the relation between P and the set of mental facts is one of strict implication, where “statement A strictly implies a statement B just in case ‘A and not-B’ involves inconsistency of a broadly logical or conceptual kind,” 2006, p. 525. There are also the arguments of Jackson (1994 & 1998) and Chalmers’ (1996) to consider, arguments purporting to show that much more follows a priori from the physical facts than what we might be inclined to think. Although, for Chalmers and Jackson, these do not include facts about the qualitative character of conscious experience.)

The fact that mental differences require physical differences would seem to have something, perhaps everything, to do with the laws of nature that actually obtain. It is arguable that the laws of nature that actually obtain are what make it the case that mental sameness guarantees physical sameness. Consider, then, the proposal that:

(N_N) facts about the distribution of physical properties nomologically necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

However, while it is reasonable to think that the supervenience of the mental on the physical is a matter of the laws of nature that actually obtain, N_N is too weak to do the work a physicalist would want a supervenience thesis to do. The physicalist who appeals to supervenience is trying to honor the fact that the mental depends entirely on the physical without being committed to the view that mental properties are identical with physical properties. Suppose, as is widely believed, that mental properties are not identical with physical properties. Then the psychophysical laws by virtue of which the physical facts fix the mental facts are not purely physical laws. In that case, N_N allows that there is a possible world that is physically indistinguishable from the actual world, including all the same purely physical laws, but with a very different distribution of mental properties. As Crane puts it, “if fixing the mental facts requires psychophysical laws, then fixing the physical facts alone is not sufficient to fix the mental facts” (1991, pp. 237-8).

To support our physicalist intuitions, it seems that we need a supervenience relation that is committed to the following necessitation claim:

(N_P) facts about the distribution of physical properties physically necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties,

where p physically necessitates q just in case ‘p and not q’ is not true in any possible world with all the same physical laws as those that actually obtain. If the physical laws did allow worlds with the same distribution of physical properties but a different distribution of mental properties, then there would be a clear sense in which the mental facts are at least partly due to something other than physical facts. So it is arguable that our physicalist intuitions do entail just what N_P states. Indeed, N_p does capture a popular way that the necessity involved in supervenience theses applied to mentality are in fact understood. (See, for example, Papineau’s formulation of Physicalism: 1993, p. 21.)

Yet, there are some worries about N_P. Lewis, Horgan, and Jackson address what is called the Problem of Extras. Lewis claims that “Materialism is meant to be a contingent thesis, a merit of our world that not all other worlds share” (1983, p. 362). Even if all concrete phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena, as Physicalism maintains, it seems that things did not have to be that way. The world could have been such that angels, ghosts, or other immaterial beings reside alongside the physical items that actually exist. It is also arguable that Physicalism allows non-actual possible worlds where all the actual physical laws obtain but with immaterial extras — provided that these extras do not causally interfere with the physical world. Horgan imagines that “[i]n such worlds the spirits would not interfere with the ordinary operations of physical laws upon physical substances; they would simply co-exist with the physical” (1982, p. 35). The concern, then, is that a possible world with the same distribution of physical properties that actually obtains and all the same physical laws might nonetheless differ from the actual world by having immaterial mental extras. If such a possible world is consistent with the truth of Physicalism, as Lewis and Horgan think, then the truth of Physicalism does not require that physical sameness (including physical laws) guarantees mental sameness. And if so, then N_P is not necessary for the truth of Physicalism.

One way to solve the Problem of Extras is to identify some restricted class of physically possible worlds and then characterize Physicalism as the view that physical sameness entails mental (and other higher-order) sameness in that restricted class of worlds. For example, Frank Jackson (1998) appeals to the notion of a minimal physical duplicate, where “a minimal physical duplicate of our world is a world that (a) is exactly like our world in every physical respect (instantiated property for instantiated property, law for law, relation for relation), and (b) contains nothing else in the sense of nothing more by way of kinds or particulars than it must to satisfy (a)” (p. 13). With this notion of a minimal physical duplicate, Jackson proposes that we characterize Physicalism in general as the view that “[a]ny world which is a minimal physical duplicate of our world is a duplicate simpliciter of our world” (p. 12). That is, if you physically duplicate the actual world and stop right there, then what results does not differ mentally or in any other way from the actual world. To restrict the class of physically possible worlds where physical sameness entails mental sameness, Lewis (1983) relies on the notion of a property’s being “alien” to a world, where “a property is alien to a world iff (1) it is not instantiated by any inhabitant of that world, and (2) it is not analysable as a conjunction of, or as a structural property constructed out of, natural properties all of which are instantiated by inhabitants of that world” (p. 364). With the notion of an alien property, Lewis offers the following supervenience claim: “[a]mong worlds where no natural properties alien to our world are instantiated, no two differ without differing physically; any two such worlds that are exactly alike physically are duplicates” (p. 364). If we think that a physically possible world with the distribution of physical properties that actually obtains might nonetheless contain immaterial mental extras, then we might restrict N_P with the help of either Lewis’ proposal or Jackson’s (or Horgan’s proposal, which appeals to the notion of a physically accessible world, a P-world, 1982, p. 36-7).

Another potential concern about N_P is expressed by Francescotti (2000, 1998). Suppose, as many believe, that mental properties are not identical with physical properties. Then the purely physical laws do not range over mental properties. In that case, Francescotti argues, the physical properties instantiated would determine which mental properties are instantiated only given the truth of irreducibly psychophysical laws. But if so, it is arguable that the truth of N_p requires that mental properties are identical with physical properties (which seems to be a threat to Non-Reductive Physicalism assuming that Physicalism requires the physical necessitation of mental facts).

The search for the exact way in which the physical facts necessitate the mental facts continues. There are also the remaining issues described in section 3-a — whether to prefer local to global supervenience, and whether and how to make the thesis super-local to capture only those physical properties that are relevant to mentality. There is also the issue of whether the supervenience base should be restricted to qualitative properties or whether non-qualitative, impure properties should also be included — properties such as containing a neural event that is numerically identical with neural event x. (Recall that Horgan’s regional supervenience thesis is restricted to qualitative properties.) There is also the question of whether it is acceptable for a supervenience thesis to be restricted to same-subject necessitation, where the base properties are restricted to properties of the very same object that bears the supervening properties. Should we prefer multiple-domain supervenience (where the supervening properties are exemplified by a domain of items that differs from the domain of the subvening properties) — allowing, for example, that the base properties are properties of constituents of the individuals with the supervening properties? While supervenience theorists have been dealing for years with these technical matters and many others regarding the details of the supervenience relation, some general objections have been raised to the whole project of trying to describe the dependence of the mental on the physical in terms of supervenience. Let’s consider two common complaints.

4. Two Common Complaints with Supervenience Theses

Kim (1993) tells us that a supervenience thesis “itself says nothing about the nature of the dependence involved; it tells us neither what kind of dependency it is, nor how the dependency grounds or explains the property covariation” (pp. 165-6). So a supervenience thesis leaves us wondering:

Is it a matter of causal dependence? Is it in some way analogous to mereological supervenience? Is it after all a matter of meaning dependence, as logical behaviorists and some functionalists claim? Perhaps, a matter of divine intervention or plan as Malebranche and Leibniz thought? Or a brute and in principle unexplainable relationship which we must accept “with natural piety,” as some emergentists used to insist? (p. 167)

There are two distinct worries expressed here — the failure of a supervenience thesis to explain mental phenomena and its failure to ontologically ground mental phenomena.

a. Explanatory Failure

If the mental supervenes on the physical as a matter of logical-conceptual necessity, then there would be an easy explanation (in terms of the laws of logic and meanings of our mental and physical terms) for why physical sameness guarantees mental sameness. Yet, if N_L-C is to be rejected, as it seems it should, then the worry is that the dependence of the mental on the physical is left unexplained. One might appeal to psychophysical laws as the explanation — P guarantees M because it is a law that P → N. But this does not explain why the psychophysical law P → N obtains. The complaint that an account expressed solely in terms of supervenience commits us to unexplained psychophysical laws has been raised by many. See, for example, Gardner (2005, p. 201-2), Kim (1989, sec. IV, 1993, pp. 165-9), Heil, (1998), Horgan (1993a, sec. 8, 1993b, sec. 5), and Moreland (1998, pp. 50-1). A physicalist might allow that there are brute laws, provided that these are purely physical. But if a law is not purely physical, if it is irreducibly psychophysical, then as a physicalist one would expect an explanation in terms of purely physical laws of why that psychophysical law obtains, and this explanation is what a mere supervenience claim does not provide. As a result, a physicalist might be compelled to find some suitable brand of what Horgan calls “superdupervenience” — “ontological supervenience that is robustly explainable in a materialistically acceptable way” (1993, p. 577).

Regarding the explanatory concern, two points are worth mentioning. First, if we are offering an ontological account of mentality, then it is not clear that a “materialistically acceptable” explanation is required. According to Physicalism as an ontological doctrine, mental (and other higher-level) phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. However, it might be that mental phenomena are entirely due to physical phenomena in a way that is inexplicable to us. So if our concern is with the ontological status of mentality, then it is arguably not a fault of a supervenience-based account that it falls short of superdupervenience. Secondly, it seems that a supervenience thesis by itself can take us some way, perhaps a long way, toward understanding the nature of the psychophysical dependence. Recall that an adequate formulation of a supervenience thesis will need to make clear what brand of necessity is involved. Suppose that mental properties supervene on physical properties with physical necessity. Then the purely physical laws that actually obtain provide the explanation of why changes in mental properties require changes in physical properties. Suppose that mental properties supervene on physical properties with nomological necessity only. Then the explanation of why the mental supervenes on the physical would appeal to irreducibly psychophysical laws. This explanation might not (and should not) satisfy a physicalist, but it is an explanation nonetheless, and perhaps even the correct explanation. Or maybe the physical facts fix the mental facts with a type of necessity that lies between the logical/conceptual variety and the physical brand — with the metaphysical necessity that some philosophers discuss. Then we might decide that the mental supervenes on the physical, not because of the physical laws that actually obtain, but due to some other type of relation, perhaps identity or maybe some mereological (part-whole) relation. It seems, then, that thinking about the modality involved in a supervenience thesis can profitably guide our thoughts about why mental properties covary with physical properties in the way that they do.

There is another reason, and perhaps a better reason than explanatory failure, to be dissatisfied with a mere supervenience thesis.

b. Ontological Failure

Since a mental-physical supervenience thesis tells us only how mental properties covary with physical properties, it is compatible not only with property dualism (as the non-reductive physicalist would hope) but also with substance dualism. Even if substance dualism were true, it might be that immaterial minds are causally connected or otherwise related to physical bodies in such a way that any variation in the properties of these immaterial minds occurs only with a variation in physical properties of the body. Physicalism certainly does not allow that substance dualism is true. So, since a supervenience thesis is compatible with substance dualism, it does not fully capture our physicalist intuitions.

However, there is still hope for an adequate formulation of Physicalism regarding mentality that is largely supervenience-based. To avoid substance dualism, we simply need to conjoin a supervenience thesis with some constraint on the composition of mental items. For example, as Geoffrey Hellman and Frank Thompson (1975) state with their Principle of Physical Exhaustion, “everything concrete is exhausted by basic physical objects” (p. 555). Likewise, Phillip Pettit (1993) insists that “[e]verything in the empirical world is composed in some way — composed without remainder — out of (subatomic) entities of the kind that microphysics posits, or it is itself uncomposed and microphysical” (p. 215). Applied to mentality, the claim is: all mental particulars (all instances and bearers of mental properties) are ultimately comprised entirely of physical particulars.

Or we might wish to combine a supervenience thesis with a realization claim. The claim that mental properties are realized physically is popular among those who support Physicalism while denying psychophysical identities. The notion of physical realization adds to the Principle of Physical Exhaustion the idea that mental properties are functional properties that are exemplified by virtue of instances of physical properties playing the definitive functional roles. So the idea that mental properties are realized physically would also seem to rule out immaterial mental items. (Indeed, Andrew Melynk, for example, 1996, 2003, and 2006, argues that a realization thesis itself, suitably refined, is enough to capture the content of Physicalism even without an independent supervenience claim.)

5. Concluding Remarks

It is widely agreed that the notion of supervenience cannot by itself fully explain the dependence of the mental on the physical. Yet, we must not underestimate the value of the concept to understanding how mental properties relate to the physical properties on which they depend. Whether or not we actually use the term ‘supervenience,’ our first step in deciding whether F-properties depend solely on G-properties is to decide whether a difference in the former requires a difference in the latter. On the basis of various thought-experiments, we might conclude that (i) F-properties do not supervene on G-properties, that is, that the former are not entirely a function of the latter (as many conclude regarding the relation between mental content and intrinsic bodily features). While (i) is a negative result, it is quite useful insofar as it directs our attention to features, perhaps previously overlooked, on which F-properties do depend (for example, surrounding linguistic practice or the internal structure of the external objects of our thought). Suppose, on the other hand, we conclude that F-properties do supervene on G-properties. Establishing this conclusion is an essential step to concluding further that (ii) F-properties are identical with G-properties (since any set of properties trivially supervenes on itself). Or instead of (ii), we might conclude that (iii) F-properties depend entirely on but are not identical with G-properties. Whichever of (i)-(iii) we choose, that choice inevitably involves deciding whether supervenience obtains.

Regarding the mental and the physical, we might decide either that (ii*) mental properties are physical properties or that (iii*) while non-physical, mental properties nonetheless depend entirely on physical properties. Being a physicalist regarding mentality seems to require accepting at least (iii*). And since both (ii*) and (iii*) entail that the mental supervenes on the physical, it seems Kim is right to note that “mind-body supervenience represents the minimal physicalist commitment” (1993, p. 168). A supervenience thesis, however, is not merely a minimal physicalist commitment, for it need not leave the mental-physical covariance wholly unexplained. Suppose we accept (ii*). Then we have a simple explanation of the covariance: changes in the mental require changes in the physical simply because the mental is the physical. On the other hand, if we accept (iii*), then as noted in section 3-a, thinking about the brand of necessity involved in our supervenience thesis (conceptual, metaphysical, physical, or nomological) can take us some way, perhaps a long way, toward figuring out what type of dependence obtains. And since even making a decision regarding (i)-(iii), or (ii*)-(iii*), requires engaging in thoughts about supervenience, the concept is not only helpful, but indispensible to understanding the relation between the two sets of properties. So whether or not the term ‘supervenience’ remains in vogue, the very notion will remain a crucial and potentially highly useful part of our inquiry into the relation between the mental and the physical. As Dean Rickles, another writer for this encyclopedia puts it, “supervenience deserves the central place that is has found in the philosophers’ toolbox” (2006).

6. References and Further Readings

Beckermann, A., H. Flohr, and J. Kim (1992). Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter).
Bennett, K. (2004). “Global Supervenience and Dependence,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 68: 510-529.
Burge, T. (1979). “Individualism and the Mental,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 4: 73-121.
Burge, T. (1986). “Individualism and Psychology,” The Philosophical Review 95: 3-45.
Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind (New York: Oxford University Press).
Chalmers, D. and F. Jackson (2001). “Conceptual Analysis and Reductive Explanation,” Philosophical Review 110: 15-60.
Crane, T. (1991). “All God Has To Do,” Analysis 51: 235-244.
Davidson, D. (1970). “Mental Events,” in L. Foster and J. W. Swanson (eds.), Experience and Theory (Amherst, MA: University of Massachusetts Press): 79-101.
Francescotti, R. (2000). “Ontological Physicalism and Property Pluralism: Why They are Incompatible,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 81: 349-362.
Francescotti (1998). “The Non-Reductionist’s Troubles with Supervenience,” Philosophical Studies 89: 105-124.
Gardner, T. (2005). “Supervenience Physicalism: Meeting the Demands of Determination and Explanation,” Philosophical Papers 34: 189-208.
Hare, R.M. (1952). The Language of Morals (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Haugeland, J. (1984). “Ontological Supervenience,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy, Supplement 22: 1-12.
Heil, J. (1998). “Supervenience Deconstructed,” European Journal of Philosophy 6: 146-155.
Hellman, G. and F. W. Thompson, (1975). “Physicalism: Ontology, Determination, and Reduction,” The Journal of Philosophy 72: 551-564.
Hoffmann-Kolss, V. (2010). The Metaphysics of Extrinsic Properties (Frankfurt: Ontos Verlag).
Hoffmann, V. and A. Newen (2007). “Supervenience of Extrinsic Properties,” Erkenntnis 67: 305-319.
Hofweber, T. (2005). “Supervenience and Object-Dependent Properties,” The Journal of Philosophy 102: 5-32.
Horgan, T. (1993a). “From Supervenience to Superdupervenience: Meeting the Demands of a Material World,” Mind 102: 555-586.
Horgan, T. (1993b). “Nonreductive Materialism and the Explanatory Autonomy of Psychology,” in S. J. Wagner and R. Warner (eds.), Naturalism (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press): 295-320.
Horgan, T. (ed.) (1984). Southern Journal of Philosophy 22: The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement, Supervenience.
Horgan, T. (1982). “Supervenience and Microphysics,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 63: 29-43.
Howell, R. J. (2009). “Emergentism and Supervenience Physicalism,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 87: 83-98.
Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics: A Defence of Conceptual Analysis (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Jackson, F. (1994). “Armchair Metaphysics,” in M. Michael and J. O’Leary-Hawthorne (eds.), Philosophy in Mind, (Dordrecht: Kluwer): 23-42.
Kim, J. (1993). Supervenience and Mind: Selected Philosophical Essays (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Kim, J. (1990). “Supervenience as a Philosophical Concept,” Metaphilosophy 21: 1-27.
Kim, J. (1989). “The Myth of Nonreductive Physicalism,” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association 63: 31-47.
Kim, J. (1987). “‘Strong’ and ‘Global’ Supervenience Revisited,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 48: 315-326.
Kim, J. (1984). “Concepts of Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 45: 153-176.
Kirk, R. (2006). “Physicalism and Strict Implication,” Synthese 151: 523-536.
Kirk, R. (1996). “Strict Implication, Supervenience, and Physicalism,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 244-256.
Lewis, D. (1986). The Plurality of Worlds (Oxford: Blackwell).
Lewis, D. (1983). “New Work for a Theory of Universals,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 61: 343-377.
McLaughlin, B. and K. Bennett (2005). “Supervenience,” in E. N. Zalta (ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
McLaughlin, B. (1995). “Varieties of Supervenience,” in E. Savellos and U. D. Yakrin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press): 16-59.
McLaughlin, B. (1992). “The Rise and Fall of British Emergentism,” in A. Beckermann, H. Flohr, and J. Kim (eds.), Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism (Berlin: De Gruyter): 49-93.
Melnyk, A. (2006). “Realization and the Formulation of Physicalism,” Philosophical Studies 131: 127-155.
Melnyk, A. (2003). A Physicalist Manifesto (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Melnyk, A. (1996). “Formulating Physicalism: Two Suggestions,” Synthese 105: 381-407.
Moore, G. E. (1922). Philosophical Studies (London: Routledge).
Moreland, J. P. (1998). “Should a Naturalist be a Supervenient Physicalist?,” Metaphilosophy 29: 35-57.
Moser, P. (1992). “Physicalism and Global Supervenience,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 30: 71-82.
Papineau, D. (1993). Philosophical Naturalism (Oxford: Blackwell).
Paull, C. and T. Sider (1992). “In Defense of Global Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 32: 830-45.
Petrie, B. (1987). “Global Supervenience and Reduction,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 48:119-30.
Pettit, P. (1993). “A Definition of Physicalism,” Analysis 53: 213-223.
Place, U. T. (1956). “Is Consciousness a Brain Process?,” The British Journal of Psychology 47: 44-50.
Poland, J. (1994). Physicalism: The Philosophical Foundations (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Putnam, H. (1975). “The Meaning of Meaning,’ in K. Gunderson (ed.), Language, Mind, and Knowledge, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science 7:131-193.
Putnam, H. (1973). “Meaning and Reference,” The Journal of Philosophy 70: 699-711.
Rickles, D. (2006). “Supervenience and Determination,” in J. Fieser and B. Dowden (eds.), Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Shoemaker, S. (1998). “Causal and Metaphysical Necessity,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 79: 59-77.
Shoemaker, S. (1980). “Causality and Properties,” in P. van Inwagen (ed.), Time and Cause (Dordrecht: D. Reidel): 109-135.
Shrader, W. (2008). “On the Relevance of Supervenience Theses to Physicalism,” Acta Analytica 23: 257-271.
Smart, J. J. C. (1959). “Sensation and Brain Processes,” The Philosophical Review 68: 141-156.
Stalnaker, R. (1996). “Varieties of Supervenience,” Philosophical Perspectives 10: 221-41.
Steward, H. (1996). “Papineau’s Physicalism,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 667-672.
Van Cleve, J. (1990). “Mind-Dust or Magic?: Panpsychism versus Emergence,” Philosophical Perspectives 4: 215-226.
Witmer, D. G. (1999). “Supervenience Physicalism and the Problem of Extras,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 37: 315-331.
Wilson, J. (2005). “Supervenience-based Formulations of Physicalism,” Nous 39: 426-459.
Yoshimi, J. (2007). “Supervenience, Determination, and Dependence,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 88: 114-133.

Author Information

Robert Francescotti
Email: rfrances@mail.sdsu.edu
San Diego State University
U. S. A.

Aquinas: Metaphysics

Metaphysics is taken by Thomas Aquinas to be the study of being qua being, that is, a study of the most fundamental aspects of being that constitute a being and without which it could not be. Aquinas’s metaphysical thought follows a modified but general Aristotelian view. Primarily, for Aquinas, a thing cannot be unless it possesses an act of being, and the thing that possesses an act of being is thereby rendered an essence/existence composite. If an essence has an act of being, the act of being is limited by that essence whose act it is. The essence in itself is the definition of a thing; and the paradigm instances of essence/existence composites are material substances (though not all substances are material for Aquinas; for example, God is not). A material substance (say, a cat or a tree) is a composite of matter and form, and it is this composite of matter and form that is primarily said to exist. In other words, the matter/form composite is predicated neither of, nor in, anything else and is the primary referent of being; all other things are said of it. The details of this very rich metaphysical landscape are described below.

The Nature of Metaphysics
Essence and Existence
Participation
Substance and Accident
Matter and Form
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. General Studies

1. The Nature of Metaphysics

Saint Thomas, that is, Aquinas, clarifies the nature of metaphysics through ascertaining its particular subject-matter, its field of investigation. In order to ascertain the subject-matter of any particular science, Thomas distinguishes between the different intellectual operations that we use when engaged in some particular scientific endeavor. Broadly speaking, these fall into two categories: the speculative and the practical. Concerning some sciences, the intellect is merely speculative by contemplating the truth of some particular subject-matter; while concerning other sciences, the intellect is practical, by ascertaining the truth and seeking to apply. There are thus correspondingly two distinct classes of science: speculative science and practical science. Speculative sciences are those that contemplate truth whereas practical sciences are those that apply truth for some practical purpose. The sciences are then further distinguished through differentiating their various subject-matters.

Insofar as the speculative sciences merely contemplate truth but do not apply it for some practical purpose, the subject-matter of the speculative sciences is that which can be understood to some extent. Working within the Aristotelian tradition, Thomas holds that something is understood when it is separated from matter and is necessary to thing in some respect. For instance, when we understand the nature of a tree, what we understand is not primarily the matter that goes to constitute the tree in question, but what it is to be a tree, or the structuring principle of the matter that so organizes it and specifies it as a tree rather than a plant. Furthermore, assuming our understanding is correct, when we understand a thing to be a tree, we do not understand it to be a dog, or a horse, or a cat. Thus, in our understanding of a tree, we understand that which is necessary for the tree to be a tree, and not of anything that is not a tree. Hence, our understanding of a thing is separated from its matter and is necessary to it in some respect. Now, what is in motion is not necessary, since what is in motion can change. Thus, the degree to which we have understood something is conditional upon the degree to which it is separated from matter and motion. It follows then that speculative objects, the subject-matter of the speculative-sciences, insofar as they are what are understood, will be separated from matter and motion to some degree. Any distinctions that obtain amongst speculative objects will in turn signify distinctions amongst the sciences that consider those objects; and we can find distinctions amongst speculative objects based upon their disposition towards matter and motion.

There are three divisions that can apply to speculative objects, thereby permitting us to differentiate the sciences that consider such objects: (i) there is a class of speculative objects that are dependent on matter and motion both for their being and for their being understood, for instance, human beings cannot be without matter, and they cannot be understood without their constituent matter (flesh and bones); (ii) there is a class of speculative objects that depend on matter and motion for their being, but not for their being understood, for instance, we can understand lines, numbers, and points without thereby understanding the matter in which they are found, yet such things cannot be without matter; (iii) there is a class of speculative objects that depend on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood.

Given these three classes of speculative objects, the speculative sciences that consider them can be enumerated accordingly: (i) physical science considers those things that depend on matter and motion both for their being and for their being understood; (ii) mathematics considers those things that depend on matter and motion for their being but not for their being understood; (iii) metaphysics or theology deals with those things that depend on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood. Before going on to consider the subject-matter of metaphysics in a little more detail, it is important to point out that Thomas takes this division of the speculative sciences as exhaustive. For Thomas, there could be no fourth speculative science; the reason for this is that the subject-matter of such a science would have to be those things that depend on matter and motion for their being understood but not for their being, for all other combinations have been exhausted. Now, if a thing depends on matter and motion for its being understood but not for its being, then matter and motion would be put into its definition, which defines a thing as it exists. But if a thing’s existence is so defined as to include matter and motion, then it follows that it depends on matter and motion for its being; for it cannot be understood to be without matter and motion. Hence, all things that include matter and motion in their definitions are dependent on matter and motion for their being, but not all things that depend on matter and motion for their being depend on matter and motion for their being understood. There could be no fourth speculative science since there is no fourth class of speculative objects depending on matter and motion for their being understood but not for their being. Thomas thus sees this threefold division of the speculative sciences as an exhaustive one.

The third class of speculative objects comprises the objects of metaphysics or theology. Now Thomas does not equate these two disciplines, but goes on to distinguish between the proper subject-matter of metaphysics and the proper subject-matter of theology. Recall that this third class of speculative objects comprises those things depending on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood. Such things are thus immaterial things; however, Thomas here draws a distinction. There are things that are immaterial insofar as they are in themselves complete immaterial substances; God and the angels would be examples of such things. To give the latter a title, let them be called positively immaterial. On the other hand there are things that are immaterial insofar as they simply do not depend on matter and motion, but can nevertheless be sometimes said to be found therein. In other words, things of the latter category are neutral with respect to being found in matter and motion, and hence they are neutrally immaterial. St Thomas’s examples of the latter are: being, substance, potency, form, act, one and many; such things can apply equally to material things (such as humans, dogs, cats, mice) and, to some extent, to positively immaterial things. Thus, the neutrally immaterial seem to signify certain aspects or modes of being that can apply equally to material and to immaterial things. The question then arises: what is the proper subject-matter of metaphysics: the positively immaterial or the neutrally immaterial?

According to Thomas, unaided human reason cannot have direct knowledge of the positively immaterial; this is because such things (God and angels) outstrip the human intellect’s capacity to know. Nevertheless, direct knowledge of the positively immaterial is possible, but this will not be on the basis of unaided human reason; it will require that the positively immaterial reveal themselves to us in some way, in which case direct knowledge of the positively immaterial will be dependent on some sort of revelation. As it is a purely rational science, not dependent on or presupposing the truths of revelation, metaphysics will be a study of the neutrally immaterial aspects of things, that is, a study of those modes of being that apply to all beings, whether they are material or immaterial. Such a study will be in accord with the Aristotelian conception of metaphysics as a study of being qua being, insofar as the neutrally immaterial apply to all beings and are not restricted to a certain class of beings. However, Thomas does not adopt the Aristotelian phrase (being qua being) as the subject-matter of metaphysics, he offers his own term. According to Thomas, ens commune (common being) is the proper subject-matter of metaphysics. Through an investigation of ens commune, an investigation into the aspects of being common to all beings, the metaphysician may indeed come to a knowledge of the causes of being and might thereby be led to the affirmation of divine being, but this is only at the end of the metaphysical inquiry, not at the beginning. Thus, metaphysics for Aquinas is a study of ens commune where this is understood as the common aspects of being without which a thing could not be; it does not presuppose the existence of divine being, and may not even be led to an affirmation of divine being (though Thomas of course offers several highly complex metaphysical arguments for the existence of divine being, but this should not be taken to be essential to the starting point of Thomistic metaphysics).

Metaphysics then is a study of the certain aspects common to all beings; and it is the task of the metaphysician to uncover the aspects of being that are indeed common and without which a thing could not be. There are certain aspects of being that are common insofar as they are generally applicable to all beings, and these are essence and existence; all beings exist and have an essence, hence metaphysics will be primarily concerned with the nature of essence and existence and their relationship to each other. Having completed an investigation into essence and existence, the metaphysician must investigate the aspects of being that are common to particular instances of being; and this will be a study of (i) the composition of substance and accident, and (ii) the composition of matter and form. The format of Thomistic metaphysics then takes a somewhat dyadic structure of descending generality: (i) essence and existence, (ii) substance and accident, (iii) matter and form. The format of the remainder of this article will be an investigation into these dyadic structures.

2. Essence and Existence

A general notion of essence is the following: essence is the definable nature of the thing that exists. Quite generally then, the essence of a thing is signified by its definition. The immediate question then is how the essence of a thing relates to its existence. In finite entities, essence is that which has existence, but it is not existence; this is a crude articulation of Thomas’s most fundamental metaphysical teaching: that essence and existence are distinct in finite entities. A consideration then of essence and existence in Thomas’s metaphysical thought will thus be a consideration of his fundamental teaching that essence and existence are distinct.

The most famous, and to a certain degree the most controversial, instance wherein Thomas argues for a distinction between a thing’s essence and its existence is in De Ente et Essentia [On Being and Essence] Chapter Four. The context is a discussion of immaterial substances and whether or not they are composed of matter. In that passage, Thomas is concerned with a popular medieval discussion known as universal hylemorphism. St Bonaventure, Thomas’s contemporary, had held that insofar as creatures are in potency in some respect, they must be material in some respect, since on the Aristotelian account, matter is the principle of potency in a thing. Thus, creatures, even immaterial creatures, must be material in some respect, even if this materiality is nothing like our corporeal materiality. Thomas takes up this issue in De Ente Chapter 4, pointing out that the Jewish thinker Avicebron seems to have been the author of this position.

Thomas takes the notion of universal hylemorphism to be absurd. Not only does it conflict with the common sayings of the philosophers, but also it is precisely as separated from matter and all material conditions that we deem separate (immaterial) substances separate, in which case they cannot be composed of matter. But if such substances cannot be composed of matter, what accounts for their potentiality? Such substances are not God, they are not pure act, they are in potentiality in some respect. So, if they are not material, then how are they in potency? Thomas is thus led to hold that they have an element of potentiality, but this is not the potency supplied by matter; rather, immaterial substances are composed of essence and existence, and it is the essence of the thing, standing in potency to a distinct act of existence, that accounts for the potentiality of creatures and thereby distinguishes them from God, who is not so composed. Thomas’s argumentation for the distinction between essence and existence unfolds on three stages and for each stage there has been at least one commentator who has held that Thomas both intended and established the real distinction therein.

In the first stage Thomas argues as follows. Whatever does not enter into the understanding of any essence is composed with that essence from without; for we cannot understand an essence without understanding the parts of that essence. But we can understand the essence of something without knowing anything about its existence; for instance, one can understand the essence of a man or a phoenix without thereby understanding the existence of either. Hence, essence and existence are distinct.

This little paragraph has generated considerable controversy, insofar as it is unclear what sort of distinction Thomas intends to establish at this stage. Is it merely a logical distinction whereby it is one thing to understand the essence of a thing and another to understand its existence? On this account, essence and existence could well be identical in the thing yet distinct in our understanding thereof (just as ‘Morning star’ and ‘Evening star’ are distinct in our conceptual expressions of the planet Venus, yet both are identical with Venus). On the other hand, does Thomas attempt to establish a real distinction whereby essence and existence are not only distinct in our understanding, but also in the thing itself? Commentators who hold that this stage only establishes a logical distinction focus on the fact that Thomas is here concerned only with our understanding of essence and not with actual (real) things; such commentators include Joseph Owens and John Wippel. Commentators who hold that this stage establishes a real distinction focus on the distinction between the act of understanding a thing’s essence and the act of knowing its existence, and they argue that a distinction in cognitional acts points to a distinction in reality; such commentators include Walter Patt, Anthony Kenny, and Steven Long.

In the second stage of argumentation, Thomas claims that if there were a being whose essence is its existence, there could only be one such being, in all else essence and existence would differ. This is clear when we consider how things can be multiplied. A thing can be multiplied in one of three ways: (i) as a genus is multiplied into its species through the addition of some difference, for instance the genus ‘animal’ is multiplied into the species ‘human’ through the addition of ‘rational’; (ii) as a species is multiplied into its individuals through being composed with matter, for instance the species ‘human’ is multiplied into various humans through being received in diverse clumps of matter; (iii) as a thing is absolute and shared in by many particular things, for instance if there were some absolute fire from which all other fires were derived. Thomas claims that a being whose essence is its existence could not be multiplied in either of the first two ways (he does not consider the third way, presumably because in that case the thing that is received or participated in is not itself multiplied; the individuals are multiplied and they simply share in some single absolute reality). A being whose essence is its existence could not be multiplied (i) through the addition of some difference, for then its essence would not be its existence but its existence plus some difference, nor could it be multiplied (ii) through being received in matter, for then it would not be subsistent, but it must be subsistent if it exists in virtue of what it is. Overall then, if there were a being whose essence is its existence, it would be unique, there could only be one such being, in all else essence and existence are distinct.

Notice that Thomas has once again concluded that essence and existence are distinct. John Wippel takes this to be the decisive stage in establishing that essence and existence are really distinct. He argues that insofar as it is impossible for there to be more than one being whose essence is its existence, there could not be in reality many such beings, in which case if we grant that there are multiple beings in reality, such beings are composed of essence and existence. On the other hand, Joseph Owens has charged Wippel with an ontological move and claims that Wippel is arguing from some positive conceptual content, to the actuality of that content in reality. Owens argues that we cannot establish the real distinction until we have established that there is something whose essence is its existence. Given the existence of a being whose essence is its existence, we can contrast its existence with the existence of finite things, and conclude that the latter are composites of essence and existence; and so Owens sees the real distinction as established at stage three of Thomas’s argumentation: the proof that there actually is a being whose essence is its existence.

Thomas begins stage three with the premise that whatever belongs to a thing belongs to it either through its intrinsic principles, its essence, or from some extrinsic principle. A thing cannot be the cause of its own existence, for then it would have to precede itself in existence, which is absurd. Everything then whose essence is distinct from its existence must be caused to be by another. Now, what is caused to be by another is led back to what exists in itself (per se). There must be a cause then for the existence of things, and this because it is pure existence (esse tantum); otherwise an infinite regress of causes would ensue.

It is here that Owens believes that Thomas establishes the real distinction; since Thomas establishes (to his own satisfaction) that there exists a being whose essence is its existence. Consequently, we can contrast the existence of such a being with the existence of finite entities and observe that in the latter existence is received as from an efficient cause whereas in the former it is not. Thus, essence and existence are really distinct. However, it is important to note that on this interpretation, the real distinction could not enter into the argument for the existence of a being whose essence is its existence; for, on Owens’s account, such argumentation is taken to establish the real distinction. If it can be shown then that Thomas’s argumentation for the existence of a being whose essence is its existence does presuppose the real distinction, then Owens’s views as to the stage at which the real distinction is established would be considerably undermined.

Having established (at some stage) that essence and existence are distinct and that there exists a being whose essence is its existence, Thomas goes on to conclude that in immaterial substances, essence is related to existence as potency to act. The latter follows insofar as what receives existence stands in potency to the existence that it receives. But all things receive existence from the being whose essence is its existence, in which case the existence that any one finite thing possesses is an act of existence that actuates a corresponding potency: the essence. Thomas has thus shown that immaterial substances do indeed have an element of potency, but this need not be a material potency.

Notice that here Thomas correlates essence and existence as potency and act only after he has concluded to the existence of a being whose essence is its existence (God). One wonders then whether or not essence and existence can be related as potency and act only on the presupposition of the existence of God. Regardless of his preferred method in the De Ente Chapter 4, Thomas could very well have focussed on the efficiently caused character of existence in finite entities (as he does in the opening lines of the argument for the existence of God), and argued that insofar as existence is efficiently caused (whether or not this is from God), existence stands to that in which it inheres as act to potency, in which case the essence that possesses existence stands in potency to that act of existence. Therefore, Thomas need not presuppose the existence of God in order to hold that essence and existence are related as potency and act; all he need presuppose is (i) that essence and existence are distinct and (ii) that existence is efficiently caused in the essence/existence composite.

3. Participation

Essence/existence composites merely have existence; whatever an essence/existence composite is, it is not its existence. Insofar as essence/existence composites merely have, but are not, existence, they participate in existence in order to exist. This is a second of Thomas’s fundamental metaphysical teachings: whatever does not essentially exist, merely participates in existence. Insofar as no essence/existence composite essentially exists, all essence/existence composites merely participate in existence. More specifically, the act of existence that each and every essence/existence composite possesses is participated in by the essence that exists.

As a definition of participation, Thomas claims that to participate is to take a part (in) (partem capere) something. Following this definition, Thomas goes on to explain how one thing can be said to take a part in and thereby participate in another; this can happen in three ways.

Firstly, when something receives in a particular fashion what pertains universally to another, it is said to participate in that other; for example, a species (‘man’) is said to participate in its genus (‘animal’) and an individual (Socrates) is said to participate in its species (‘man’) because they (the species and the individual) do not possess the intelligible structure of that in which they participate according to its full universality.

Secondly, a subject is said to participate in the accidents that it has (for instance, a man is a certain colour, and thereby participates in the colour of which he is), and matter is said to participate in the formal structure that it has (for instance, the matter of a statue participates in the shape of that statue in order to be the statue in question).

Thirdly, an effect can be said to participate in its cause, especially when the effect is not equal to the power of that cause. The effect particularises and determines the scope of the cause; for the effect acts as the determinate recipient of the power of the cause. The effect receives from its cause only that which is necessary for the production of the effect. It is in this way that a cause is participated in by its effect.

In all of the foregoing modes of participation, to participate is to limit that which is participated in some respect. This follows from the original etymological definition of participation, that to participate is to take a part (in); for if to participate is merely to take a part in something, the participant will not possess the nature of the thing in which it participates in any total fashion, but only in partial fashion. What then can we conclude about the participation framework that governs essence and existence?

Essences exist, but they do not exist essentially, they participate in their acts of existence. Insofar as an essence participates in its act of existence, the essence limits that act of existence to the nature of the essence whose act it is; for the essence merely has existence, it is not existence, in which case its possession of existence will be in accord with the nature of the essence. The act of existence is thus limited and thereby individuated to the essence whose act it is. As a concrete application of this, consider the following. George Bush’s existence is not Tony Blair’s existence; when George Bush came into existence, Tony Blair did not come into existence, and when George Bush ceases to exist, Tony Blair will, in all likelihood, not cease to exist. George Bush’s existence is not indexed to the existence of Tony Blair, in which case the existence of either George Bush or Tony Blair is not identical to the other. The act of existence then is individuated to the essence whose act it is, and this because the essence merely participates in, and thereby limits, the act of existence that it possesses.

4. Substance and Accident

The next fundamental metaphysical category is that of substance. According to Aquinas, substances are what are primarily said to exist, and so substances are what have existence but yet are not identical with existence. Aquinas’s ontology then is comprised primarily of substances, and all change is either a change of one substance into another substance, or a modification of an already existing substance. Given that essence is that which is said to possess existence, but is not identical to existence, substances are essence/existence composites; their existence is not guaranteed by what they are. They simply have existence as limited by their essence.

Let us begin with a logical definition of substance, as this will give us an indication of its metaphysical nature. Logically speaking, a substance is what is predicated neither of nor in anything else. This captures the fundamental notion that substances are basic, and everything else is predicated either of or in them. Now, if we transpose this logical definition of substance to the realm of metaphysics, where existence is taken into consideration, we can say that a substance is that whose nature it is to exist not in some subject or as a part of anything else, but what exists in itself. Thus, a substance is a properly basic entity, existing per se (though of course depending on an external cause for its existence), and the paradigm instances of which are the medium sized objects that we see around us: horses, cats, trees and humans.

On the other hand there are accidents. Accidents are what accrue to substances and modify substances in some way. Logically speaking, accidents are predicated of or in some substance; metaphysically speaking, accidents cannot exist in themselves but only as part of some substance. As their name suggests, accidents are incidental to the thing, and they can come and go without the thing losing its identity; whereas a thing cannot cease to be the substance that it is without losing its identity.

Accidents only exist as part of some substance. It follows then that we cannot have un-exemplified properties as if they were substances in themselves. Properties are always exemplified by some substance, whereas substance itself is un-exemplifiable. For example, brown is always predicated of something, we say that x is brown, in which case brown is an accident. However, brown is never found to be in itself, it is always exemplified by something of which it is said.

Within Aquinas’s metaphysical framework, substances can be both material (cats, dogs, humans) and immaterial (angels), but as noted above, the paradigm instances of substances are material substances, and the latter are composites of matter and form; a material substance is neither its matter alone nor its form alone, since matter and form are always said to be of some individual and never in themselves. It follows then that material substances have parts, and the immediate question arises as to whether or not the parts of substances are themselves substances. In order to address this issue, we must ask two questions: (i) while they are parts of a substance, are such parts themselves substances? and (ii) are the parts of a substance themselves things that can exist without the substance of which they are parts?

Concerning (i) we must say that whilst they are parts of a substance such parts cannot be substances; this is so given the definition of substance outlined above: that whose nature it is to exist not in some subject. Given that the parts of a substance are in fact parts of a substance, it is their nature to exist in some subject of which they are a part. Consequently, the parts of a substance cannot themselves be substances.

Concerning (ii) the case is somewhat different, now we must consider whether or not the parts of a substance can exist without the substance of which they are parts, that is, after the dissolution of the substance of which they are parts do the parts become substances in themselves? The parts of a substance receive their identity through being the parts of the substance whose parts they are. Thus, the flesh and bone of a human are flesh and bone precisely because they are parts of a human. When the human dies, the flesh and bone are no longer flesh and bone (except equivocally speaking) because they are no longer parts of a human substance; rather, the flesh and bone cease to function as flesh and bone and begin to decompose, in which case they are not themselves substances. However, on Aquinas’s view, the elements out of which a substance is made can indeed subsist beyond the dissolution of the substance. Thus, whilst the elements are parts of the substance, they are not, as parts of a substance, substances in themselves, but when the substance dissolves, the elements will remain as independent substances in their own right. Thus, in the case of the dissolution of the human being, whilst the flesh and bone no longer remain but decompose, the elements that played a role in the formation of the substance remain. In more contemporary terms we could say that before they go to make up the bodily substances we see in the world, atoms are substances in themselves, but when united in a certain form they go to make cats, dogs, humans, and cease to be independent substances in themselves. When the cat or dog or human perishes, its flesh and bones perish with it, but its atoms regain their substantial nature and they remain as substances in themselves. So, a substance can have its parts, and for as long as those parts are parts of a substance, those parts are not substances in themselves, but when the substance decomposes, those parts can be considered as substances in themselves so long as they are capable of subsisting in themselves.

5. Matter and Form

A very crude definition of matter would be that it is the ‘stuff’ out of which a thing is made, whereas form is signified by the organisation that the matter takes. A common example used by Aquinas and his contemporaries for explaining matter and form was that of a statue. Consider a marble statue. The marble is the matter of the statue whereas the shape signifies the form of the statue. The marble is the ‘stuff’ out of which the statue is made whereas the shape signifies the form that the artist decided to give to the statue. On a more metaphysical level, form is the principle whereby the matter has the particular structure that it has, and matter is simply that which stands to be structured in a certain way. It follows from this initial account that matter is a principle of potency in a thing; since if the matter is that which stands to be structured in a certain way, matter can be potentially an indefinite number of forms. Form on the other hand is not potentially one thing or another; form as form is the kind of thing that it is and no other.

On Aquinas’s account, there are certain levels of matter/form composition. On one level we can think of the matter of a statue as being the marble whereas we can think of the shape of the statue as signifying the form. But on a different level with can think of the marble as signifying the form and something more fundamental being the matter. For instance, before the marble was formed into the statue by the sculptor, it was a block of marble, already with a certain form that made it ‘marble’. At this level, the marble cannot be the matter of the thing, since its being marble and not, say, granite, is its form. Thus, there is a more fundamental level of materiality that admits of being formed in such a way that the end product is marble or granite, and at a higher level, this formed matter stands as matter for the artist when constructing the statue.

If we think of matter as without any form, we come to the notion of prime matter, and this is a type of matter that is totally unformed, pure materiality itself. Prime matter is the ultimate subject of form, and in itself indefinable; we can only understand prime matter through thinking of matter as wholly devoid of form. As wholly devoid of form prime matter is neither a substance nor any of the other categories of being; prime matter, as pure potency, cannot in fact express any concrete mode of being, since as pure potency is does not exist except as potency. Thus, prime matter is not a thing actually existing, since it has no principle of act rendering it actually existing.

Matter can be considered in two senses: (i) as designated and (ii) as undesignated. Designated matter is the type of matter to which one can point and of which one can make use. It is the matter that we see around us. Undesignated matter is a type of matter that we simply consider through the use of our reason; it is the abstracted notion of matter. For instance, the actual flesh and bones that make up an individual man are instances of designated matter, whereas the notions of ‘flesh’ and ‘bones’ are abstracted notions of certain types of matter and these are taken to enter into the definition of ‘man’ as such. Designated matter is what individuates some form. As noted, the form of a thing is the principle of its material organisation. A thing’s form then can apply to many different things insofar as those things are all organised in the same way. The form then can be said to be universal, since it remains the same but is predicated over different things. As signifying the actual matter that is organised in the thing, designated matter individuates the form to ‘this’ or ‘that’ particular thing, thereby ensuring individuals (Socrates, Plato, Aristotle) of the same form (man).

Given that form is the principle of organisation of a thing’s matter, or the thing’s intelligible nature, form can be of two kinds. On the one hand, form can be substantial, organising the matter into the kind of thing that the substance is. On the other hand, form can be accidental, organising some part of an already constituted substance. We can come to a greater understanding of substantial and accidental form if we consider their relation to matter. Substantial form always informs prime matter and in doing so it brings a new substance into existence; accidental form simply informs an already existing substance (an already existing composite of substantial form and prime matter), and in doing so it simply modifies some substance. Given that substantial form always informs prime matter, there can be only one substantial form of a thing; for if substantial form informs prime matter, any other form that may accrue to a thing is posterior to it and simply informs an already constituted substance, which is the role of accidental form. Thus, there can only be one substantial form of a thing.

As stated above, essence is signified by the definition of a thing; essence is the definable nature of the thing that exists. A thing’s essence then is its definition. It follows that on Thomas’s account the essence of a thing is the composition of its matter and form, where matter here is taken as undesignated matter. Contrary to contemporary theories of essence, Aquinas does not, strictly speaking, take essence to be what is essential to the thing in question, where the latter is determined by a thing’s possessing some property or set of properties in all possible worlds. In the latter context, the essence of a thing comprises its essential properties, properties that are true of it in all possible worlds; but this is surely not Aquinas’s view. For Aquinas, the essence of a thing is not the conglomeration of those properties that it would possess in all possible worlds, but the composition of matter and form. On a possible-worlds view of essence, the essence of a thing could not signify the matter/form composite as it is in this actual world, since such a composite could be different in some possible world and therefore not uniform across all possible worlds. Thus, Aquinas does not adopt a possible-worlds view of essence; he envisages the essence of a thing as the definition or quiddity of the thing existing in this world, not as it would exist in all possible worlds.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

St Thomas Aquinas, Summa Theologiae, trans. Fathers of the English Dominican Province (1948), U.S.A: Christian Classics.
- Aquinas’s philosophical and theological masterpiece; Part I (Prima Pars) is the most important for Thomas’s metaphysical thought.
St Thomas Aquinas, The Divisions and Methods of the Sciences: Questions V and VI of his Commentary on the De Trinitate of Boethius, trans. Armand Maurer (1953) Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
- A detailed consideration by Thomas of the divisions and methods of the sciences.
St Thomas Aquinas, On Being and Essence, trans. Armand Maurer (1968), Toronto: Pontifical Institute Medieval Studies.
- An excellent summary from Aquinas himself of his metaphysical views.
St Thomas Aquinas, Summa Contra Gentiles, trans. A.C Pegis (1975), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
- One of Aquinas’s great Summae; books I and II are most important for Thomas’s metaphysical thought.
St Thomas Aquinas, Commentary on Aristotle’s Metaphysics, trans. John P. Rowan (1995), U.S.A: Dumb Ox Books.
- A direct commentary on the Metaphysics of Aristotle.
St Thomas Aquinas, Aquinas on matter and form and the elements: a translation and interpretation of the De principiis naturae and the De mixtione elementorum of St. Thomas Aquinas, trans. Joseph Bobik (1998), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
- A translation of and commentary on Aqiunas’s works on ‘matter and form and the elements’.

b. General Studies

Clarke, W.N., Explorations in Metaphysics — Being, God, Person (1994), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Clarke, W.N., The One and the Many — A Contemporary Thomistic Metaphysics (2001), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Copleston, F., Aquinas (1955), London: Penguin.
Davies, B., The Thought of Thomas Aquinas (1993), Oxford: Clarendon Paperbacks.
Fabro, C., La Nozione Metafisica di Partecipazione secondo S. Tommaso d’Aquino (1950), Turin: Società Editrice Internazionale.
Fabro, C., Participation et causalité selon S. Thomas d’Aquin (1961), Louvain: Publications Universaitaires.
- Both works by Fabro were groundbreaking for their uncovering the Platonic influences in Aquinas’s thought.
de Finance, J., Être et agir dans la philosophie de Saint Thomas (1960), Rome: Librairie Éditrice de l’Université Grégorienne.
Geiger, L-B., La participation dans la philosophie de s. Thomas d’Aquin (1953), Paris: Librairie Philosophique J. Vrin.
- As with Fabro’s work, Geiger’s too uncovers the Platonic influences in Aquinas’s thought.
Kenny, A., Aquinas on Being (2003), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Klima, G., ‘Contemporary “Essentialism” vs. Aristotelian Essentialism’, in John Haldane, ed., Mind Metaphysics, and Value in the Thomistic and Analytical Traditions (2002), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Kretzman, N., & Stump, E. eds. The Cambridge Companion to Aquinas (1993), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Long, S., ‘On the Natural Knowledge of the Real Distinction’, Nova et Vetera (2003), 1:1.
Long, S., ‘Aquinas on Being and Logicism’, New Blackfriars (2005), 86.
Owens, J., ‘A Note on the Approach to Thomistic Metaphysics’, The New Scholasticism (1954), 28:4.
Owens, J., ‘Quiddity and the Real Distinction in St Thomas Aquinas’, Mediaeval Studies (1965), 27.
Owens, J., The Doctrine of Being in the Aristotelian Metaphysics (1978), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
Owens, J., St Thomas Aquinas on the Existence of God — The Collected Papers of Joseph Owens ed. Catan, John. R. (1980), Albany: State University of New York Press.
Owens, J., ‘Stages and Distinction in De Ente’, The Thomist, (1981), 45.
Owens, J., An Elementary Christian Metaphysics (1985), Houston, Texas: Bruce Publishing Company.
Owens, J., An Interpretation of Existence (1985), Texas: Center for Thomistic Studies — University of St Thomas.
Owens, J., ‘Aquinas’s Distinction at De Ente et Essentia 4.119 — 123’, Mediaeval Studies (1986), 48.
Patt, W. ‘Aquinas’s Real Distinction and some Interpretations’, The New Scholasticism (1988), 62:1.
Stump, E., Aquinas (2003), London-New York: Routledge.
- Part I, Chapter I, offers a very good survey of Aquinas’s metaphysics, but leaves out details of his theory of essence/existence composition. Pp. 36 – 44 are particularly illuminating on matter and form, substance and accident.
Torrell, J.-P., Saint Thomas Aquinas: The Person and His Work, trans. Robert Royal (1996), Washington: The Catholic University of America Press.
- This is the most up-to-date publication on Aquinas’s life and work.
te Velde R. A., Participation and Substantiality in Thomas Aquinas (1995), Leiden-New York-Cologne: E.J. Brill.
Wippel, J., 1979: ‘Aquinas’s Route to the Real Distinction’, The Thomist, 43.
Wippel, J., Metaphysical Themes in Thomas Aquinas (1984), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
Wippel, J., The Metaphysical Thought of Thomas Aquinas (2000), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
Wippel, J., Metaphysical Themes in Thomas Aquinas II (2007), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
- Wippel’s work is generally taken to be essential for scholarly work on Aquinas’s metaphysical thought.

Author Information

Gaven Kerr
Email: gkerr07@qub.ac.uk
Queen’s University Belfast
Northern Ireland

David Hume (1711—1776)

“Hume is our Politics, Hume is our Trade, Hume is our Philosophy, Hume is our Religion, — it wants little but that Hume is even our Taste”. This statement by nineteenth century philosopher James Hutchison Stirling reflects the unique position in intellectual thought held by Scottish philosopher David Hume. Part of Hume’s fame and importance owes to his boldly skeptical approach to a range of philosophical subjects. In epistemology, he questioned common notions of personal identity, and argued that there is no permanent “self” that continues over time. He dismissed standard accounts of causality and argued that our conceptions of cause-effect relations are grounded in habits of thinking, rather than in the perception of causal forces in the external world itself. He defended the skeptical position that human reason is inherently contradictory, and it is only through naturally-instilled beliefs that we can navigate our way through common life. In the philosophy of religion, he argued that it is unreasonable to believe testimonies of alleged miraculous events, and he hints, accordingly, that we should reject religions that are founded on miracle testimonies. Against the common belief of the time that God’s existence could be proven through a design or causal argument, Hume offered compelling criticisms of standard theistic proofs. He also advanced theories on the origin of popular religious beliefs, grounding such notions in human psychology rather than in rational argument or divine revelation. The larger aim of his critique was to disentangle philosophy from religion and thus allow philosophy to pursue its own ends without rational over-extension or psychological corruption. In moral theory, against the common view that God plays an important role in the creation and reinforcement of moral values, he offered one of the first purely secular moral theories, which grounded morality in the pleasing and useful consequences that result from our actions. He introduced the term “utility” into our moral vocabulary, and his theory is the immediate forerunner to the classic utilitarian views of Jeremy Bentham and John Stuart Mill. He is famous for the position that we cannot derive ought from is, the view that statements of moral obligation cannot simply be deduced from statements of fact. Some see Hume as an early proponent of the emotivist metaethical view that moral judgments principally express our feelings. He also made important contributions to aesthetic theory with his view that there is a uniform standard of taste within human nature, in political theory with his critique of social contractarianism, and economic theory with his anti-mercantilist views. As a philosophical historian, he defended the conservative view that British governments are best run through a strong monarchy.

Life
Origin and Association of Ideas
Epistemological Issues
Skepticism
Theory of the Passions
Religious Belief
Moral Theory
Aesthetic, Political, and Economic Theory
History and Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Life

David Hume was born in 1711 to a moderately wealthy family from Berwickshire Scotland, near Edinburgh. His background was politically Whiggish and religiously Calvinistic. As a child he faithfully attended the local Church of Scotland, pastored by his uncle. Hume was educated by his widowed mother until he left for the University of Edinburgh at the age of eleven. His letters describe how as a young student he took religion seriously and obediently followed a list of moral guidelines taken from The Whole Duty of Man, a popular Calvinistic devotional.

Leaving the University of Edinburgh around the age of fifteen to pursue his education privately, he was encouraged to consider a career in law, but his interests soon turned to philosophy. During these years of private study he began raising serious questions about religion, as he recounts in the following letter:

Tis not long ago that I burn’d an old Manuscript Book, wrote before I was twenty; which contain’d, Page after Page, the gradual Progress of my Thoughts on that head [i.e. religious belief]. It begun with an anxious Search after Arguments, to confirm the common Opinion: Doubts stole in, dissipated, return’d, were again dissipated, return’d again [To Gilbert Elliot of Minto, March 10, 1751].

Although his manuscript book was destroyed, several pages of his study notes survive from his early twenties. These show a preoccupation with proofs for God’s existence as well as atheism, particularly as he read on these topics in classical Greek and Latin texts and in Pierre Bayle’s skeptical Historical and Critical Dictionary. During these years of private study, some of which were in France, he composed his three-volume Treatise of Human Nature, which was published anonymously in two installments before he was thirty (1739, 1740). The Treatise explores several philosophical topics such as space, time, causality, external objects, the passions, free will, and morality, offering original and often skeptical appraisals of these notions. Book I of the Treatise was unfavorably reviewed in the History of the Works of the Learned with a succession of sarcastic comments. Although scholars today recognized it as a philosophical masterpiece, Hume was disappointed with the minimal interest his book spawned and said that “It fell dead-born from the press, without reaching such distinctions even to excite a murmur among the zealots” (My Own Life).

In 1741 and 1742 Hume published his two-volume Essays, Moral and Political, which were written in a popular style and were more successful than the Treatise. In 1744-1745 he was a candidate for the Chair of Moral Philosophy at the University of Edinburgh. The Edinburgh Town Council was responsible for electing a replacement, and critics opposed Hume by condemning his anti-religious writings. Chief among the critics was clergyman William Wishart (d. 1752), the Principal of the University of Edinburgh. Lists of allegedly dangerous propositions from Hume’s Treatise circulated, presumably penned by Wishart himself. In the face of such strong opposition, the Edinburgh Town Council consulted the Edinburgh ministers. Hoping to win over the clergy, Hume composed a point by point reply to the circulating lists of dangerous propositions, which was published as A Letter from a Gentleman to his Friend in Edinburgh. The clergy were not swayed, 12 of the 15 ministers voted against Hume, and he quickly withdrew his candidacy. In 1745 Hume accepted an invitation from General St Clair to attend him as secretary. He wore the uniform of an officer, and accompanied the general on an expedition against Canada (which ended in an incursion on the coast of France) and to an embassy post in the courts of Vienna and Turin.

Because of the success of his Essays, Hume was convinced that the poor reception of his Treatise was caused by its style rather than by its content. In 1748 he published his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, a more popular rendition of portions of Book I of the Treatise. The Enquiry also includes two sections not found in the Treatise: “Of Miracles” and a dialogue titled “Of a Particular Providence and of a Future State.” Each section contains direct attacks on religious belief. In 1751 he published his Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, which recasts parts of Book III of the Treatise in a very different form. The work establishes a system of morality upon utility and human sentiments alone, and without appeal to divine moral commands. By the end of the century Hume was recognized as the founder of the moral theory of utility, and utilitarian political theorist Jeremy Bentham acknowledged Hume’s direct influence upon him. The same year Hume also published his Political Discourses, which drew immediate praise and influenced economic thinkers such as Adam Smith, William Godwin, and Thomas Malthus.

In 1751-1752 Hume sought a philosophy chair at the University of Glasgow, and was again unsuccessful. In 1752 his new employment as librarian of the Advocate’s Library in Edinburgh provided him with the resources to pursue his interest in history. There, he wrote much of his highly successful six-volume History of England (published from 1754 to 1762). The first volume was unfavorably received, partially for its defense of Charles I, and partially for two sections which attack Christianity. In one passage Hume notes that the first Protestant reformers were fanatical or “inflamed with the highest enthusiasm” in their opposition to Roman Catholic domination. In the second passage he labels Roman Catholicism a superstition which “like all other species of superstition. . . rouses the vain fears of unhappy mortals.” The most vocal attack against Hume’s History came from Daniel MacQueen in his 300 page Letters on Mr. Hume’s History. MacQueen scrutinizes the first volume of Hume’s work, exposing all the allegedly “loose and irreligious sneers” Hume makes against Christianity. Ultimately, this negative response led Hume to delete the two controversial passages from succeeding editions of the History.

Around this time Hume also wrote his two most substantial works on religion: The Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion and The Natural History of Religion. The Natural History appeared in 1757, but, on the advice of friends who wished to steer Hume away from religious controversy, the Dialogues remained unpublished until 1779, three years after his death. The Natural History aroused controversy even before it was made public. In 1756 a volume of Hume’s essays titled Five Dissertations was printed and ready for distribution. The essays included (1) “The Natural History of Religion;” (2) “Of the Passions;” (3) “Of Tragedy;” (4) “Of Suicide;” and (5) “Of the Immortality of the Soul.” The latter two essays made direct attacks on common religious doctrines by defending a person’s moral right to commit suicide and by criticizing the idea of life after death. Early copies were passed around, and Hume’s publisher was threatened with prosecution if the book was distributed as it was. The printed copies of Five Dissertations were then physically altered by removing the essays on suicide and immortality, and inserting a new essay “Of the Standard of Taste” in their place. Hume also took this opportunity to alter two particularly offending paragraphs in the Natural History. The essays were then bound with the new title Four Dissertations and distributed in January, 1757.

In the years following Four Dissertations, Hume completed his last major literary work, The History of England, which gave him a reputation as an historian that equaled, if not overshadowed, his reputation as a philosopher. In 1763, at age 50, he was invited to accompany the Earl of Hertford to the embassy in Paris, with a near prospect of being his secretary. He eventually accepted, and remarks at the reception he received in Paris “from men and women of all ranks and stations.” He returned to Edinburgh in 1766, and continued developing relations with the greatest minds of the time. Among these was Jean Jacques Rousseau who in 1766 was ordered out of Switzerland by the government in Berne. Hume offered Rousseau refuge in England and secured him a government pension. In England, Rousseau became suspicious of plots, and publicly charged Hume with conspiring to ruin his character, under the appearance of helping him. Hume published a pamphlet defending his actions and was exonerated. Another secretary appointment took him away from 1767-1768. Returning again to Edinburgh, his remaining years were spent revising and refining his published works, and socializing with friends in Edinburgh’s intellectual circles. In 1770, fellow Scotsman James Beattie published one of the harshest attacks on Hume’s philosophy to ever appear in print, entitled An Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth in Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism. Hume was upset by Beattie’s relentless verbal attacks against him in the work, but the book made Beattie famous and King George III, who admired it, awarded Beattie a pension of £200 per year.

In 1776, at age sixty-five, Hume died from an internal disorder which had plagued him for many months. After his death, his name took on new significance as several of his previously unpublished works appeared. The first was a brief autobiography, My Own Life, but even this unpretentious work aroused controversy. As his friends, Adam Smith and S.J. Pratt, published affectionate eulogies describing how he died with no concern for an afterlife, religious critics responded by condemning this unjustifiable admiration of Hume’s infidelity. Two years later, in 1779, Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion appeared. Again, the response was mixed. Admirers of Hume considered it a masterfully written work, while religious critics branded it as dangerous to religion. Finally, in 1782, Hume’s two suppressed essays on suicide and immortality were published. Their reception was almost unanimously negative.

2. Origin and Association of Ideas

Drawing heavily on John Locke’s empiricism, the opening sections of both the Treatise and Enquiry discuss the origins of mental perceptions as laid out in the following categorical scheme:

Perceptions

A. Ideas

1. From memory

2. From imagination

a. From fancy

b. From understanding

(1) Involving relations of ideas

(2) Involving matters of fact

B. Impressions

1. Of sensation (external)

2. Of reflection (internal)

Hume begins by dividing all mental perceptions between ideas (thoughts) and impressions (sensations and feelings), and then makes two central claims about the relation between them. First, advancing what is commonly called Hume’s copy thesis, he argues that all ideas are ultimately copied from impressions. That is, for any idea we select, we can trace the component parts of that idea to some external sensation or internal feeling. This claim places Hume squarely in the empiricist tradition, and he regularly uses this principle as a test for determining the content of an idea under consideration. As proof of the copy thesis, Hume challenges anyone who denies it “to shew a simple impression, that has not a correspondent idea, or a simple idea, that has not a correspondent impression” (Treatise, 1.1.1). Second, advancing what we may call Hume’s liveliness thesis, he argues that ideas and impressions differ only in terms of liveliness. For example, my impression of a tree is simply more vivid than my idea of that tree. One of his early critics, Lord Monboddo (1714–1799) pointed out an important implication of the liveliness thesis, which Hume himself presumably hides. Most modern philosophers held that ideas reside in our spiritual minds, whereas impressions originate in our physical bodies. So, when Hume blurs the distinction between ideas and impressions, he is ultimately denying the spiritual nature of ideas and instead grounding them in our physical nature. In short, all of our mental operations—including our most rational ideas—are physical in nature. As Monboddo writes, “One consequence, which Mr Hume has drawn from this doctrine, is, that, as our Mind can only operate by the organs of the Body, it must perish with the Body” (Ancient Metaphysics, 1782, 2.2.2).

Hume goes on to explain that there are several mental faculties that are responsible for producing our various ideas. He initially divides ideas between those produced by the memory, and those produced by the imagination. The memory is a faculty that conjures up ideas based on experiences as they happened. For example, the memory I have of my drive to the store is a comparatively accurate copy of my previous sense impressions of that experience. The imagination, by contrast, is a faculty that breaks apart and combines ideas, thus forming new ones. Hume uses the familiar example of a golden mountain: this idea is a combination of an idea of gold and an idea of a mountain. As our imagination takes our most basic ideas and leads us to form new ones, it is directed by three principles of association, namely, resemblance, contiguity, and cause and effect. By virtue of resemblance, an illustration or sketch, of a person leads me to an idea of that actual person. The idea of one apartment in a building leads me to think of the apartment contiguous to—or next to—the first. The thought of a scar on my hand leads me to think of a broken piece of glass that caused the scar.

As indicated in the above chart, our more complex ideas of the imagination are further divided between two categories. Some imaginative ideas represent flights of the fancy, such as the idea of a golden mountain; however, other imaginative ideas represent solid reasoning, such as predicting the trajectory of a thrown ball. The fanciful ideas are derived from the faculty of the fancy, and are the source of fantasies, superstitions, and bad philosophy. By contrast, sound ideas are derived from the faculty of the understanding—or reason—and are of two types: (1) involving relations of ideas; or (2) involving matters of fact. A relation of ideas (or relation between ideas) is a mathematical relation that is “discoverable by the mere operation of thought, without dependence on what is anywhere existent in the universe,” such as the mathematical statement “the square of the hypotenuse is equal to the square of the two sides” (Enquiry, 4). By contrast, a matter of fact, for Hume, is any object or circumstance which has physical existence, such as “the sun will rise tomorrow”. This split between relations of ideas and matters of fact is commonly called “Hume’s Fork”, and Hume himself uses it as a radical tool for distinguishing between well-founded ideas of the understanding, and unfounded ideas of the fancy. He dramatically makes this point at the conclusion of his Enquiry:

When we run over libraries, persuaded of these principles, what havoc must we make? If we take in our hand any volume; of divinity or school metaphysics, for instance; let us ask, Does it contain any abstract reasoning concerning quantity or number? No. Does it contain any experimental reasoning concerning matter of fact and existence? No. Commit it then to the flames: For it can contain nothing but sophistry and illusion (Enquiry, 12).

For Hume, when we imaginatively exercise our understanding regarding relations of ideas and matters of fact, our minds are guided by seven philosophical or “reasoning” relations, which are as follows:

Principles of reasoning concerning relations of ideas (involving demonstration): (1) resemblance; (2) contrariety; (3) degrees in quality; and (4) proportions in quantity or number

Principles of reasoning concerning matters of fact (involving judgments of probability): (5) identity; (6) relations in time and place; and (7) causation

Human understanding and reasoning at its best, then, involves ideas that are grounded in the above seven principles.

3. Epistemological Issues

Much of Hume’s epistemology is driven by a consideration of philosophically important issues, such as space and time, cause-effect, external objects, personal identity, and free will. In his analysis of these issues in the Treatise, he repeatedly does three things. First, he skeptically argues that we are unable to gain complete knowledge of some important philosophical notion under consideration. Second, he shows how the understanding gives us a very limited idea of that notion. Third, he explains how some erroneous views of that notion are grounded in the fancy, and he accordingly recommends that we reject those erroneous ideas. We will follow this three-part scheme as we consider Hume’s discussions of various topics.

a. Space

On the topic of space, Hume argues that our proper notions of space are confined to our visual and tactile experiences of the three-dimensional world, and we err if we think of space more abstractly and independently of those visual and tactile experiences. In essence, our proper notion of space is like what Locke calls a “secondary quality” of an object, which is spectator dependent, meaning grounded in the physiology of our perceptual mental processes. Thus, our proper notion of space is not like a “primary quality” that refers to some external state of affairs independent of our perceptual mental process. Following the above three-part scheme, (1) Hume skeptically argues that we have no ideas of infinitely divisible space (Treatise, 1.2.2.2). (2) When accounting for the idea we do have of space, he argues that “the idea of space is convey’d to the mind by two senses, the sight and touch; nor does any thing ever appear extended, that is not either visible or tangible” (Treatise, 1.2.3.15). Further, he argues that these objects—which are either visible or tangible—are composed of finite atoms or corpuscles, which are themselves “endow’d with colour and solidity.” These impressions are then “comprehended” or conceived by the imagination; it is from the structuring of these impressions that we obtain a limited idea of space. (3) In contrast to this idea of space, Hume argues that we frequently presume to have an idea of space that lacks visibility or solidity. He accounts for this erroneous notion in terms of a mistaken association that people naturally make between visual and tactile space (Treatise, 1.2.5.21).

b. Time

Hume’s treatment of our idea of time is like his treatment of the idea of space, in that our proper idea of time is like a secondary quality, grounded in our mental operations, not a primary quality grounded in some external phenomenon beyond our experience. (1) He first maintains that we have no idea of infinitely divisible time (Treatise, 1.2.4.1). (2) He then notes Locke’s point that our minds operate at a range of speeds that are “fix’d by the original nature and constitution of the mind, and beyond which no influence of external objects on the senses is ever able to hasten or retard our thought” (Treatise, 1.2.3.7). The idea of time, then, is not a simple idea derived from a simple impression; instead, it is a copy of impressions as they are perceived by the mind at its fixed speed (Treatise, 1.2.3.10). (3) In contrast to this limited view of time, he argues that we frequently entertain a faulty notion of time that does not involve change or succession. The psychological account of this erroneous view is that we mistake time for the cause of succession instead of seeing it as the effect (Treatise, 1.2.5.29).

c. Necessary Connection between Causes and Effects

According to Hume, the notion of cause-effect is a complex idea that is made up of three more foundational ideas: priority in time, proximity in space, and necessary connection. Concerning priority in time, if I say that event A causes event B, one thing I mean is that A occurs prior to B. If B were to occur before A, then it would be absurd to say that A was the cause of B. Concerning the idea of proximity, if I say that A causes B, then I mean that B is in proximity to, or close to A. For example, if I throw a rock, and at that moment someone’s window in China breaks, I would not conclude that my rock broke a window on the other side of the world. The broken window and the rock must be in proximity with each other. Priority and proximity alone, however, do not make up our entire notion of causality. For example, if I sneeze and the lights go out, I would not conclude that my sneeze was the cause, even though the conditions of priority and proximity were fulfilled. We also believe that there is a necessary connection between cause A and effect B. During the modern period of philosophy, philosophers thought of necessary connection as a power or force connecting two events. When billiard ball A strikes billiard ball B, there is a power that the one event imparts to the other. In keeping with his empiricist copy thesis, that all ideas are copied from impressions, Hume tries to uncover the experiences which give rise to our notions of priority, proximity, and necessary connection. The first two are easy to explain. Priority traces back to our various experiences of time. Proximity traces back to our various experiences of space. But what is the experience which gives us the idea of necessary connection? This notion of necessary connection is the specific focus of Hume’s analysis of cause-effect.

Hume’s view is that our proper idea of necessary connection is like a secondary quality that is formed by the mind, and not, like a primary quality, a feature of the external world. (1) He skeptically argues that we cannot get an idea of necessary connection by observing it through sensory experiences (Treatise, 1.3.14.12 ff.). We have no external sensory impression of causal power when we observe cause-effect relationships; all that we ever see is cause A constantly conjoined with effect B. Neither does it arise from an internal impression, such as when we introspectively reflect on willed bodily motions or willing the creation of thoughts. These internal experiences are too elusive, and nothing in them can give content to our idea of necessary connection. (2) The idea we have of necessary connection arises as follows: we experience a constant conjunction of events A and B— repeated sense experiences where events resembling A are always followed by events resembling B. This produces a habit such that upon any further appearance of A, we expect B to follow. This, in turn, produces an internal feeling of expectation “to pass from an object to the idea of its usual attendant,” which is the impression from which the idea of necessary connection is copied (Treatise, 1.3.14.20). (3) A common but mistaken notion on this topic is that necessity resides within the objects themselves. He explains this mistaken belief by the natural tendency we have to impute subjectively perceived qualities to external things (Treatise, 1.3.14.24).

d. External Objects

Hume’s view on external objects is that the mind is programmed to form some concept of the external world, although this concept or idea is really just a fabrication. (1) Hume’s skeptical claim here is that we have no valid conception of the existence of external things (Treatise, 1.2.6.9). (2) Nevertheless, he argues that we have an unavoidable “vulgar” or common belief in the continued existence of objects, and this idea he accounts for. His explanation is lengthy, but involves the following features. Perceptions of objects are disjointed and have no unity in and of themselves (Treatise, 1.4.2.29). In an effort to organize our perceptions, we first naturally assume that there is no distinction between our perceptions and the objects that are perceived (this is the so-called “vulgar” view of perception). We then conflate all ideas (of perceptions), which put our minds in similar dispositions (Treatise, 1.4.2.33); that is, we associate resembling ideas and attribute identity to their causes. Consequently, we naturally invent the continued and external existence of the objects (or perceptions) that produced these ideas (Treatise, 1.4.2.35). Lastly, we go on to believe in the existence of these objects because of the force of the resemblance between ideas (Treatise, 1.4.2.36). Although this belief is philosophically unjustified, Hume feels he has given an accurate account of how we inevitably arrive at the idea of external existence. (3) In contrast to the previous explanation of this idea, he recommends that we doubt a more sophisticated but erroneous notion of existence—the so-called philosophical view—which distinguishes between perceptions and the external objects that cause perceptions. The psychological motivation for accepting this view is this: our imagination tells us that resembling perceptions have a continued existence, yet our reflection tells us that they are interrupted. Appealing to both forces, we ascribe interruption to perceptions and continuance to objects (Treatise, 1.4.2.52).

e. Personal Identity

Regarding the issue of personal identity, (1) Hume’s skeptical claim is that we have no experience of a simple, individual impression that we can call the self—where the “self” is the totality of a person’s conscious life. He writes, “For my part, when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other, of heat or cold, light or shade, love or hatred, pain or pleasure. I never can catch myself at any time without a perception, and never can observe anything but the perception” (Treatise, 1.4.6.3). (2) Even though my perceptions are fleeting and I am a bundle of different perceptions, I nevertheless have some idea of personal identity, and that must be accounted for (Treatise, 1.4.6.4). Because of the associative principles, the resemblance or causal connection within the chain of my perceptions gives rise to an idea of myself, and memory extends this idea past my immediate perceptions (Treatise, 1.4.6.18 ff.). (3) A common abuse of the notion of personal identity occurs when the idea of a soul or unchanging substance is added to give us a stronger or more unified concept of the self (Treatise, 1.4.6.6).

f. Free Will

On the issue of free will and determinism—or “liberty” and “necessity” in Hume’s terminology—Hume defends necessity. (1) He first argues that “all actions of the will have particular causes” (Treatise, 2.3.2.8), and so there is no such thing as an uncaused willful action. (2) He then defends the notion of a will that consistently responds to prior motivational causes: “our actions have a constant union with our motives, tempers, and circumstances” (Treatise, 2.3.1.4). These motives produce actions that have the same causal necessity observed in cause-effect relations that we see in external objects, such as when billiard ball A strikes and moves billiard ball B. In the same way, we regularly observe the rock-solid connection between motive A and action B, and we rely on that predictable connection in our normal lives. Suppose that a traveler, in recounting his observation of the odd behavior of natives in a distant country, told us that identical motives led to entirely different actions among these natives. We would not believe the traveler’s report. In business, politics, and military affairs, our leaders expect predicable behavior from us insofar as the same motives within us will always result in us performing the same action. A prisoner who is soon to be executed will assume that the motivations and actions of the prison guards and the executioner are so rigidly fixed that these people will mechanically carry out their duties and perform the execution, with no chance of a change of heart (Treatise, 2.3.1.5 ff.). (3) Lastly, Hume explains why people commonly believe in an uncaused will (Treatise, 2.3.2.1 ff.). One explanation is that people erroneously believe they have a feeling of liberty when performing actions. The reason is that, when we perform actions, we feel a kind of “looseness or indifference” in how they come about, and some people wrongly see this as “an intuitive proof of human liberty” (Treatise, 2.3.2.2).

In the Treatise Hume rejects the notion of liberty completely. While he gives no definition of “liberty” in that work, he argues that the notion is incompatible with necessity, and, at best, “liberty” simply means chance. In the Enquiry, however, he takes a more compatiblist approach. All human actions are caused by specific prior motives, but liberty and necessity are reconcilable when we define liberty as “a power of acting or not acting, according to the determinations of the will” (Enquiry, 8). Nothing in this definition of liberty is in conflict with the notion of necessity.

4. Skepticism

In all of the above discussions on epistemological topics, Hume performs a balancing act between making skeptical attacks (step 1) and offering positive theories based on natural beliefs (step 2). In the conclusion to Book 1, though, he appears to elevate his skepticism to a higher level and exposes the inherent contradictions in even his best philosophical theories. He notes three such contradictions. One centers on what we call induction. Our judgments based on past experience all contain elements of doubt; we are then impelled to make a judgment about that doubt, and since this judgment is also based on past experience it will in turn produce a new doubt. Once again, though, we are impelled to make a judgment about this second doubt, and the cycle continues. He concludes that “no finite object can subsist under a decrease repeated in infinitum.” A second contradiction involves a conflict between two theories of external perception, each of which our natural reasoning process leads us to. One is our natural inclination to believe that we are directly seeing objects as they really are, and the other is the more philosophical view that we only ever see mental images or copies of external objects. The third contradiction involves a conflict between causal reasoning and belief in the continued existence of matter. After listing these contradictions, Hume despairs over the failure of his metaphysical reasoning:

The intense view of these manifold contradictions and imperfections in human reason has so wrought upon me, and heated my brain, that I am ready to reject all belief and reasoning, and can look upon no opinion even as more probable or likely than another [Treatise, 1.4.7.8].

He then pacifies his despair by recognizing that nature forces him to set aside his philosophical speculations and return to the normal activities of common life. He sees, though, that in time he will be drawn back into philosophical speculation in order to attack superstition and educate the world.

Hume’s emphasis on these conceptual contradictions is a unique aspect of his skepticism, and if any part of his philosophy can be designated “Humean skepticism” it is this. However, during the course of his writing the Treatise his view of the nature of these contradictions changed. At first he felt that these contradictions were restricted to theories about the external world, but theories about the mind itself would be free from them, as he explains here:

The essence and composition of external bodies are so obscure, that we must necessarily, in our reasonings, or rather conjectures concerning them, involve ourselves in contradictions and absurdities. But as the perceptions of the mind are perfectly known, and I have us’d all imaginable caution in forming conclusions concerning them, I have always hop’d to keep clear of those contradictions, which have attended every other system [Treatise, 2.2.6.2].

When composing the Appendix to the Treatise a year later, he changed his mind and felt that theories about the mind would also have contradictions:

I had entertained some hopes, that however deficient our theory of the intellectual world might be, it wou’d be free from those contradictions, and absurdities, which seem to attend every explication, that human reason can give of the material world. But upon a more strict review of the section concerning I find myself involv’d in such a labyrinth, that, I must confess, I neither know how to correct my former opinions, nor how to render them consistent. If this be not a good general reason for scepticism, ’tis at least a sufficient one (if I were not already abundantly supplied) for me to entertain a diffidence and modesty in all my decisions [Treatise, Appendix].

Thus, in the Treatise, the skeptical bottom line is that even our best theories about both physical and mental phenomena will be plagued with contradictions. In the concluding section of his Enquiry, Hume again addresses the topic of skepticism, but treats the matter somewhat differently: he rejects extreme skepticism but accepts skepticism in a more moderate form. He associates extreme Pyrrhonian skepticism with blanket attacks on all reasoning about the external world, abstract reasoning about space and time, or causal reasoning about matters of fact. He argues, though, that we must reject such skepticism since “no durable good can ever result from it.” Instead, he recommends a more moderate or Academic skepticism that tones down Pyrrhonism by, first, exercising caution and modesty in our judgments, and, second, by restricting our speculations to abstract reasoning and matters of fact.

5. Theory of the Passions

Like many philosophers of his time, Hume developed a theory of the passions—that is, the emotions—categorizing them and explaining the psychological mechanisms by which they arise in the human mind. His most detailed account is in Book Two of the Treatise. Passions, according to Hume, fall under the category of impressions of reflection (as opposed to impressions of sensation). He opens his discussion with a taxonomy of types of passions, which are outlined here:

Reflective Impressions

1. Calm (reflective pleasures and pains)

2. Violent

a. Direct (desire, aversion, joy, grief, hope, fear)

b. Indirect (love, hate, pride, humility)

He initially divides passions between the calm and the violent. He concedes that this distinction is imprecise, but he explains that people commonly distinguish between types of passions in terms of their degrees of forcefulness. Adding more precision to this common distinction, he maintains that calm passions are emotional feelings of pleasure and pain associated with moral and aesthetic judgments. For example, when I see a person commit a horrible deed, I will experience a feeling of pain. When I view a good work of art, I will experience a feeling of pleasure. In contrast to the calm passions, violent ones constitute the bulk of our emotions, and these divide between direct and indirect passions. For Hume, the key direct passions are desire, aversion, joy, grief, hope, and fear. They are called “direct” because they arise immediately—without complex reflection on our part—whenever we see something good or bad. For example, if I consider an unpleasant thing, such as being burglarized, then I will feel the passion of aversion. He suggests that sometimes these passions are sparked instinctively—for example, by my desire for food when I am hungry. Others, though, are not connected with instinct and are more the result of social conditioning. There is an interesting logic to the six direct passions, which Hume borrowed from a tradition that can be traced to ancient Greek Stoicism. We can diagram the relation between the six with this chart:

When good/bad objects are considered abstractly

Desire (towards good objects)

Aversion (towards evil objects)

When good/bad objects are actually present

Joy (towards good objects)

Grief (towards evil objects)

When good/bad objects are only anticipated

Hope (towards good objects)

Fear (towards evil objects)

Compare, for example, the passions that I will experience regarding winning the lottery vs. having my house burglarized. Suppose that I consider them purely in the abstract—or “consider’d simply” as Hume says (Treatise, 2.3.9.6). I will then desire to win the lottery and have an aversion towards being burglarized. Suppose that both situations are actually before me; I will then experience joy over winning the lottery and grief over being burglarized. Suppose, finally, that I know that at some unknown time in the future I will win the lottery and be burglarized. I will then experience hope regarding the lottery and fear of being burglarized.

Hume devotes most of Book 2 to an analysis of the indirect passions, his unique contribution to theories of the passions. The four principal passions are love, hate, pride, and humility. They are called “indirect” since they are the secondary effects of a previous feeling of pleasure and pain. Suppose, for example, that I paint a picture, which gives me a feeling of pleasure. Since I am the artist, I will then experience an additional feeling of pride. He explains in detail the psychological process that triggers indirect passions such as pride. Specifically, he argues that these passions arise from a double relation between ideas and impressions, which we can illustrate here with the passion of pride:

1. I have an initial idea of some possession, or “subject”, such as my painting, and this idea gives me pleasure.

2. Through the associative principle of resemblance, I then immediately associate this feeling of pleasure with a resembling feeling of pride (this association constitutes the first relation in the double relation).

3. This feeling of pride then causes me to have an idea of myself, as the “object” of pride.

4. Through some associative principle such as causality, I then associate the idea of myself with the idea of my painting, which is the “subject” of my pride (this association constitutes the second relation in the double relation).

According to Hume, the three other principal indirect passions arise in parallel ways. For example, if my painting is ugly and causes me pain, then I will experience the secondary passion of humility—perhaps more accurately expressed as “humiliation”. By contrast, if someone else paints a pleasing picture, then this will trigger in me a feeling of love for that artist—perhaps more accurately expressed as “esteem”. If the artist paints a painfully ugly picture, then this will trigger in me a feeling of “hatred” towards the artist—perhaps more accurately expressed as “disesteem”.

One of the most lasting contributions of Hume’s discussion of the passions is his argument that human actions must be prompted by passion, and never can be motivated by reason. Reason, he argues, is completely inert when it comes to motivating conduct, and without some emotion we would not engage in any action. Thus, he writes, “Reason is, and ought only to be the slave of the passions, and can never pretend to any other office than to serve and obey them” (Treatise, 2.3.3.4).

6. Religious Belief

Like many of Hume’s philosophical views, his position on religious belief is also skeptical. Critics of religion during the eighteenth-century needed to express themselves cautiously to avoid being fined, imprisoned, or worse. Sometimes this involved placing controversial views in the mouth of a character in a dialogue. Other times it involved adopting the persona of a deist or fideist as a means of concealing a more extreme religious skepticism. Hume used all of the rhetorical devices at his disposal, and left it to his readers to decode his most controversial conclusions on religious subjects. During the Enlightenment, there were two pillars of traditional Christian belief: natural and revealed religion. Natural religion involves knowledge of God drawn from nature through the use of logic and reason, and typically involves logical proofs regarding the existence and nature of God, such as the causal and design arguments for God’s existence. Revealed religion involves knowledge of God contained in revelation, particularly the Bible, the quintessential examples of which are biblical prophesies and miracles where God intervenes in earthly affairs to confirm the Bible’s message of salvation. Hume attacks both natural and revealed religious beliefs in his various writings.

a. Miracles

In a 1737 letter to Henry Home, Hume states that he intended to include a discussion of miracles in his Treatise, but ultimately left it out for fear of offending readers. His analysis of the subject eventually appeared some ten years later in his essay “Of Miracles” from the Enquiry, and is his first sustained attack on revealed religion. It is probably this main argument to which Hume refers. The first of this two-part essay contains the argument for which Hume is most famous: uniform experience of natural law outweighs the testimony of any alleged miracle. Let us imagine a scale with two balancing pans. In the first pan we place the strongest evidence in support of the occurrence of a miracle. In the second we place our life-long experience of consistent laws of nature. According to Hume, the second pan will always outweigh the first. He writes:

It is experience only, which gives authority to human testimony [regarding miracles]; and it is the same experience, which assures us of the laws of nature. When, therefore, these two kinds of experience are contrary, we have nothing to do but subtract the one from the other, and embrace an opinion, either on one side or the other, with that assurance which arises from the remainder. But according to the principle here explained, this subtraction, with regard to all popular religions, amounts to an entire annihilation [Enquiry, 10.1].

Regardless of how strong the testimony is in favor of a given miracle, it can never come close to counterbalancing the overwhelming experience of unvaried laws of nature. Thus, proportioning one’s belief to the evidence, the wise person must reject the weaker evidence concerning the alleged miracle.

In the second part of “Of Miracles”, Hume discusses four factors that count against the credibility of most miracle testimonies: (1) witnesses of miracles typically lack integrity; (2) we are naturally inclined to enjoy sensational stories, and this has us uncritically perpetuate miracle accounts; (3) miracle testimonies occur most often in less civilized countries; and (4) miracles support rival religious systems and thus discredit each other. But even if a miracle testimony is not encumbered by these four factors, we should still not believe it since it would be contrary to our consistent experience of laws of nature. He concludes his essay with the following cryptic comment about Christian belief in biblical miracles:

upon the whole, we may conclude, that the Christian Religion not only was at first attended with miracles, but even at this day cannot be believed by any reasonable person without one. Mere reason is insufficient to convince us of its veracity: And whoever is moved by Faith to assent to it, is conscious of a continued miracle in his own person, which subverts all the principles of his understanding, and gives him a determination to believe what is most contrary to custom and experience [Enquiry, 10.2].

At face value, his comment suggests a fideist approach to religious belief such as what Pascal recommends. That is, reason is incapable of establishing religious belief, and God must perform a miracle in our lives to make us open to belief through faith. However, according to the eighteenth-century Hume critic John Briggs, Hume’s real point is that belief in Christianity requires “miraculous stupidity” (The Nature of Religious Zeal, 1775).

b. Psychology of Religious Belief

Another attack on revealed religion appears in Hume’s essay “The Natural History of Religion” (1757). It is one of the first systematic attempts to explain the causes of religious belief solely in terms of psychological and sociological factors. We might see the “Natural History” as an answer to a challenge, such as the sort that William Adams poses here in his attack on Hume’s “Of Miracles”:

Whence could the religion and laws of this people [i.e., the Jews] so far exceed those of the wisest Heathens, and come out at once, in their first infancy, thus perfect and entire; when all human systems are found to grow up by degrees, and to ripen, after many improvements; into perfection [An Essay, Part 2]?

According to Adams, only divine intervention can account for the sophistication of the ancient Jewish religion. In the “Natural History,” though, Hume offers an alternative explanation, and one that is grounded solely in human nature, without God’s direct involvement in human history.

The work may be divided into three parts. In the first (Sections 1 and 4), Hume argues that polytheism, and not monotheism, was the original religion of primitive humans. Monotheism, he believes, was only a later development that emerged with the progress of various societies. The standard theory in Judeo-Christian theology was that early humans first believed in a single God, but as religious corruption crept in, people lapsed into polytheism. Hume was the first writer to systematically defend the position of original polytheism. In the second part (Sections 2-3, 5-8), Hume establishes the psychological principles that give rise to popular religious belief. His thesis is that natural instincts—such as fear and the propensity to adulate—are the true causes of popular religious belief, and not divine intervention or rational argument. The third part of this work (Sections 9-15) compares various aspects of polytheism with monotheism, showing that one is no more superior than the other. Both contain points of absurdity. From this he concludes that we should suspend belief on the entire subject of religious truth.

c. Arguments for God’s Existence

Around the same time that Hume was composing his “Natural History of Religion” he was also working on his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, which appeared in print two decades later, after his death. As the title of the work implies, it is a critique of natural religion, in contrast with revealed religion. There are three principal characters in the Dialogues. A character named Cleanthes, who espouses religious empiricism, defends the design argument for God’s existence, but rejects the causal argument. Next, a character named Demea, who is a religious rationalist, defends the causal argument for God’s existence, but rejects the design argument. Finally, a character named Philo, who is a religious skeptic, argues against both the design and causal arguments. The main assaults on theistic proofs are conveyed by both Cleanthes and Philo, and, to that extent, both of their critiques likely represent Hume’s views.

The specific version of the causal argument that Hume examines is one by Samuel Clarke (and Leibniz before him). Simplistic versions of the causal argument maintain that when we trace back the causes of things in the universe, the chain of causes cannot go back in time to infinity past; there must be a first cause to the causal sequence, which is God. Clarke’s version differs in that it is theoretically possible for causal sequences of events to trace back through time to infinity past. Thus, we cannot argue that God’s existence is required to initiate a sequence of temporal causes. Nevertheless, Clarke argued, an important fact still needs to be explained: the fact that this infinite temporal sequence of causal events exists at all. Why does something exist rather than nothing? God, then, is the necessary cause of the whole series. In response, the character Cleanthes argues that the flaw in the cosmological argument consists in assuming that there is some larger fact about the universe that needs explaining beyond the particular items in the series itself. Once we have a sufficient explanation for each particular fact in the infinite sequence of events, it makes no sense to inquire about the origin of the collection of these facts. That is, once we adequately account for each individual fact, this constitutes a sufficient explanation of the whole collection. He writes, “Did I show you the particular causes of each individual in a collection of twenty particles of matter, I should think it very unreasonable, should you afterwards ask me, what was the cause of the whole twenty” (Dialogues, 9).

The design argument for God’s existence is that the appearance of design in the natural world is evidence for the existence of a divine designer. The specific version of the argument that Hume examines is one from analogy, as stated here by Cleanthes:

The curious adapting of means to ends, throughout all nature, resembles exactly, though it much exceeds, the productions of human contrivance; of human designs, thought, wisdom, and intelligence. Since, therefore, the effects resemble each other, we are led to infer, by all the rules of analogy, that the causes also resemble; and that the Author of Nature is somewhat similar to the mind of man (Dialogues, 2).

Philo presents several criticisms against the design argument, many of which are now standard in discussions of the issue. According to Philo, the design argument is based on a faulty analogy: we do not know whether the order in nature was the result of design, since, unlike our experience with the creation of machines, we did not witness the formation of the world. In Philo’s words, “will any man tell me with a serious countenance, that an orderly universe must arise from some thought and art like the human, because we have experience of it? To ascertain this reasoning, it were requisite that we had experience of the origin of worlds; and it is not sufficient, surely, that we have seen ships and cities arise from human art and contrivance” (ibid). Further, the vastness of the universe also weakens any comparison with human artifacts. Although the universe is orderly here, it may be chaotic elsewhere. Similarly, if intelligent design is exhibited only in a small fraction of the universe, then we cannot say that it is the productive force of the whole universe. Philo states that “A very small part of this great system, during a very short time, is very imperfectly discovered to us; and do we thence pronounce decisively concerning the origin of the whole?” (ibid). Philo also argues that natural design may be accounted for by nature alone, insofar as matter may contain within itself a principle of order, and “This at once solves all difficulties” (Dialogues, 6). And even if the design of the universe is of divine origin, we are not justified in concluding that this divine cause is a single, all powerful, or all good being. According to Philo, “Whether all these attributes are united in one subject, or dispersed among several independent beings, by what phenomena in nature can we pretend to decide the controversy?” (Dialogues 5).

7. Moral Theory

Hume’s moral theory appears in Book 3 of the Treatise and in An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751). He opens his discussion in the Treatise by telling us what moral approval is not: it is not a rational judgment about either conceptual relations or empirical facts. To make his case he criticizes Samuel Clarke’s rationalistic account of morality, which is that we rationally judge the fitness or unfitness of our actions in reference to eternal laws of righteousness, that are self-evidently known to all humans, just as is our knowledge of mathematical relations. Hume presents several arguments against Clarke’s view, one of which is an analogy from arboreal parricide: a young tree that overgrows and kills its parent exhibits the same alleged relations as a human child killing his parent. “Is not the one tree the cause of the other’s existence; and the latter the cause of the destruction of the former, in the same manner as when a child murders his parent?” (Treatise, 3.1.1.24). If morality is a question of relations, then the young tree is immoral, which is absurd. Hume also argues that moral assessments are not judgments about empirical facts. Take any immoral action, such as willful murder: “examine it in all lights, and see if you can find that matter of fact, or real existence, which you call vice” (Treatise, 3.1.1.25). You will not find any such fact, but only your own feelings of disapproval. In this context Hume makes his point that we cannot derive statements of obligation from statements of fact. When surveying various moral theories, Hume writes, “I am surpriz’d to find, that instead of the usual copulations of propositions, is, and is not, I meet with no proposition that is not connected with an ought or an ought not” (Treatise, 3.1.1.26). This move from is to ought is illegitimate, he argues, and is why people erroneously believe that morality is grounded in rational judgments.

Thus far Hume has only told us what moral approval is not, namely a judgment of reason. So what then does moral approval consist of? It is an emotional response, not a rational one. The details of this part of his theory rest on a distinction between three psychologically distinct players: the moral agent, the receiver, and the moral spectator. The moral agent is the person who performs an action, such as stealing a car; the receiver is the person impacted by the conduct, such as the owner of the stolen car; and the moral spectator is the person who observes and, in this case, disapproves of the agent’s action. This agent-receiver-spectator distinction is the product of earlier moral sense theories championed by the Earl of Shaftesbury (1671-1713), Joseph Butler (1692-1752), and Francis Hutcheson (1694-1747). Most generally, moral sense theories maintained that humans have a faculty of moral perception, similar to our faculties of sensory perception. Just as our external senses detect qualities in external objects, such as colors and shapes, so too does our moral faculty detect good and bad moral qualities in people and actions.

For Hume, all actions of a moral agent are motivated by character traits, specifically either virtuous or vicious character traits. For example, if you donate money to a charity, then your action is motivated by a virtuous character trait. Hume argues that some virtuous character traits are instinctive or natural, such as benevolence, and others are acquired or artificial, such as justice. As an agent, your action will have an effect on a receiver. For example, if you as the agent give food to a starving person, then the receiver will experience an immediately agreeable feeling from your act. Also, the receiver may see the usefulness of your food donation, insofar as eating food will improve his health. When considering the usefulness of your food donation, then, the receiver will receive another agreeable feeling from your act. Finally, I, as a spectator, observe these agreeable feelings that the receiver experiences. I, then, will sympathetically experience agreeable feelings along with the receiver. These sympathetic feelings of pleasure constitute my moral approval of the original act of charity that you, the agent, perform. By sympathetically experiencing this pleasure, I thereby pronounce your motivating character trait to be a virtue, as opposed to a vice. Suppose, on the other hand, that you as an agent did something to hurt the receiver, such as steal his car. I as the spectator would then sympathetically experience the receiver’s pain and thereby pronounce your motivating character trait to be a vice, as opposed to a virtue.

In short, that is Hume’s overall theory. There are, though, some important details that should also be mentioned. First, it is tricky to determine whether an agent’s motivating character trait is natural or artificial, and Hume decides this one virtue at a time. For Hume, the natural virtues include benevolence, meekness, charity, and generosity. By contrast, the artificial virtues include justice, keeping promises, allegiance and chastity. Contrary to what one might expect, Hume classifies the key virtues that are necessary for a well-ordered state as artificial, and he classifies only the more supererogatory virtues as natural. Hume’s critics were quick to point out this paradox. Second, to spark a feeling of moral approval, the spectator does not have to actually witness the effect of an agent’s action upon a receiver. The spectator might simply hear about it, or the spectator might even simply invent an entire scenario and think about the possible effects of hypothetical actions. This happens when we have moral reactions when reading works of fiction: “a very play or romance may afford us instances of this pleasure, which virtue conveys to us; and pain, which arises from vices” (Treatise, 3.1.2.2).

Third, although the agent, receiver, and spectator have psychologically distinct roles, in some situations a single person may perform more than one of these roles. For example, if I as an agent donate to charity, as a spectator to my own action I can also sympathize with the effect of my donation on the receiver. Finally, given various combinations of spectators and receivers, Hume concludes that there are four irreducible categories of qualities that exhaustively constitute moral virtue: (1) qualities useful to others, which include benevolence, meekness, charity, justice, fidelity and veracity; (2) qualities useful to oneself, which include industry, perseverance, and patience; (3) qualities immediately agreeable to others, which include wit, eloquence and cleanliness; and (4) qualities immediately agreeable to oneself, which include good humor, self-esteem and pride. For Hume, most morally significant qualities and actions seem to fall into more than one of these categories. When Hume spoke about an agent’s “useful” consequences, he often used the word “utility” as a synonym. This is particularly so in the Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals where the term “utility” appears over 50 times. Moral theorists after Hume thus depicted his moral theory as the “theory of utility”—namely, that morality involves assessing the pleasing and painful consequences of actions on the receiver. It is this concept and terminology that inspired classic utilitarian philosophers, such as Jeremy Bentham (1748–1832).

8. Aesthetic, Political, and Economic Theory

Hume wrote two influential essays on the subject of aesthetic theory. In “Of Tragedy” (1757) he discusses the psychological reasons why we enjoy observing depictions of tragic events in theatrical production. He argues that “the energy of expression, the power of numbers, and the charm of imitation” convey the sense of pleasure. He particularly stresses the technical artistry involved when an artistic work imitates the original. In “Of the Standard of Taste” (1757) he argues that there is a uniform sense of artistic judgment in human nature, similar to our uniform sense of moral judgment. Specific objects consistently trigger feelings of beauty within us, as our human nature dictates. Just as we can refine our external senses such as our palate, we can also refine our sense of artistic beauty and thus cultivate a delicacy of taste. In spite of this uniform standard of taste, two factors create some difference in our judgments: “the one is the different humours of particular men; the other, the particular manners and opinions of our age and country.”

In political theory, Hume has both theoretical discussions on the origins of government and more informal essays on popular political controversies of his day. In his theoretical discussions, he attacks two basic notions in eighteenth-century political philosophy: the social contract and the instinctive nature of justice regarding private property. In his 1748 essay “Of the Original Contract,” he argues that political allegiance is not grounded in any social contract, but instead on our general observation that society cannot be maintained without a governmental system. He concedes that in savage times there may have been an unwritten contract among tribe members for the sake of peace and order. However, he argues, this was no permanent basis of government as social contract theorists pretend. There is nothing to transmit that original contract onwards from generation to generation, and our experience of actual political events shows that governmental authority is founded on conquest, not elections or consent. We do not even tacitly consent to a contract since many of us have no real choice about remaining in our countries: “Can we seriously say that a poor peasant or artisan has a free choice to leave his country, when he knows no foreign language or manners, and lives from day to day by the small wages which he acquires?” Political allegiance, he concludes, is ultimately based on a primary instinct of selfishness, and only through reflection will we see how we benefit from an orderly society.

Concerning private property, in both the Treatise and the Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751), Hume in essence argues against Locke’s notion of the natural right to private property. For Hume, we have no primary instinct to recognize private property, and all conceptions of justice regarding property are founded solely on how useful the convention of property is to us. We can see how property ownership is tied to usefulness when considering scenarios concerning the availability of necessities. When necessities are in overabundance, I can take what I want any time, and there is no usefulness in my claiming any property as my own. When the opposite happens and necessities are scarce, I do not acknowledge anyone’s claim to property and take what I want from others for my own survival. Thus, “the rules of equity or justice [regarding property] depend entirely on the particular state and condition in which men are placed, and owe their origin and existence to that utility, which results to the public from their strict and regular observance” (Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, 3). Further, if we closely inspect human nature, we will never find a primary instinct that inclines us to acknowledge private property. It is nothing like the primary instinct of nest building in birds. While the sense of justice regarding private property is a firmly fixed habit, it is nevertheless its usefulness to society that gives it value.

As for Hume’s informal essays on popular political controversies, several of these involve party disputes between the politically conservative Tory party that supported a strong monarchy, and the politically liberal Whig party which supported a constitutional government. Two consistent themes emerge in these essays. First, in securing peace, a monarchy with strong authority is probably better than a pure republic. Hume sides with the Tories because of their traditional support of the monarchy. Except in extreme cases, he opposes the Lockean argument offered by Whigs that justifies overthrowing political authorities when those authorities fail to protect the rights of the people. Hume notes, though, that monarchies and republics each have their strong points. Monarchies encourage the arts, and republics encourage science and trade. Hume also appreciates the mixed form of government within Great Britain, which fosters liberty of the press. The second theme in Hume’s political essays is that revolutions and civil wars principally arise from zealousness within party factions. Political moderation, he argues, is the best antidote to potentially ruinous party conflict.

In economic theory, Hume wrote influential essays on money, interest, trade, credit, and taxes. Many of these target the mercantile system and its view that a country increases its wealth by increasing the quantity of gold and silver in that country. For mercantilists, three means were commonly employed to this end: (1) capture gold, silver and raw material from other countries through colonization; (2) discourage imports through tariffs and monopolies, which keeps acquired gold and silver within one’s country’s borders; and, (3) increase exports, which brings in money from outside countries. In Great Britain, mercantile policies were instituted through the Navigation Acts, which prohibited trade between British colonies and foreign countries. These protectionist laws ultimately led to the American Revolution. The most famous of Hume’s anti-mercantilist arguments is now called Hume’s gold-flow theory, and appears in his essays “Of Money” (1752) and “Of the Balance of Trade” (1752). Contrary to mercantilists who advocated locking up money in one’s home country, Hume argued that increased money in one country automatically disperses to other countries. Suppose, for example, that Great Britain receives an influx of new money. This new money will drive up prices of labor and domestic products in Great Britain. Products in foreign countries, then, will be cheaper than in Great Britain; Britain, then, will import these products, thereby sending new money to foreign countries. Hume compares this reshuffling of wealth to the level of fluids in interconnected chambers: if I add fluid to one chamber, then, under the weight of gravity, this will disperse to the others until the level is the same in all chambers. A similar phenomenon will occur if we lose money in our home country by purchasing imports from foreign countries. As the quantity of money decreases in our home country, this will drive down the prices of labor and domestic products. Our products, then, will be cheaper than foreign products, and we will gain money through exports. On the fluid analogy, by removing fluid from one chamber, more fluid is drawn in from surrounding chambers.

9. History and Philosophy

Although Hume is now remembered mainly as a philosopher, in his own day he had at least as much impact as a historian. His History of England appeared in four installments between 1754 and 1762 and covers the periods of British history from most ancient times through the seventeenth-century. To his 18th and 19th century readers, he was not just another historian, but a uniquely philosophical historian who had an ability to look into the minds of historical figures and uncover the motives behind their conduct. A political theme underlying the whole History is, once again, a conflict between Tory and Whig ideology. In the Britain of Hume’s day, a major point of contention between the two parties was whether the English government was historically an absolute or limited monarchy. Tories believed that it was traditionally absolute, with governmental authority being grounded in royal prerogative. Whigs, on the other hand, believed that it was traditionally limited, with the foundation of government resting in the individual liberty of the people, as expressed in the parliamentary voice of the commons. As a historian, Hume felt that he was politically moderate, tending to see both the strengths and weaknesses in opposing viewpoints:

With regard to politics and the character of princes and great men, I think I am very moderate. My views of things are more conformable to Whig principles; my representations of persons to Tory prejudices. Nothing can so much prove that men commonly regard more persons than things, as to find that I am commonly numbered among the Tories [Hume to John Clephane, 1756].

However, to radical Whig British readers, Hume was a conservative Tory who defended royal prerogative.

Hume takes two distinct positions on the prerogative issue. From a theoretical and idealistic perspective, he favored a mixed constitution, mediating between the authority of the monarch and that of the Parliament. Discussing this issue in his 1741 Essays, he holds that we should learn “the lesson of moderation in all our political controversies.” However, from the perspective of how British history actually unfolded, he emphasized royal prerogative. And, as a “philosophical historian,” he tried to show how human nature gave rise to the tendency towards royal prerogative. In his brief autobiography, “My Own Life,” he says that he rejected the “senseless clamour” of Whig ideology, and believed “It is ridiculous to consider the English constitution before that period [of the Stuart Monarchs] as a regular plan of liberty.” Gilbert Stuart best encapsulated Hume’s historical stance on the prerogative issue: “his history, from its beginning to its conclusion, is chiefly to be regarded as a plausible defence of prerogative” (A View of Society in Europe, 1778, 2.1.1). In short, Hume’s Tory narrative is this. As early as the Anglo Saxon period, the commons did not participate in the king’s advisory council. The Witenagemot, for example, was only a council of nobles and bishops, which the king could listen to or ignore as he saw fit. Throughout the succeeding centuries, England’s great kings were those who exercised absolute rule, and took advantage of prerogative courts such as the Star Chamber. Elizabeth—England’s most beloved monarch—was in fact a tyrant, and her reign was much like that of a Turkish sultan. Charles I—a largely virtuous man—tried to follow in her footsteps as a strong monarch. After a few minor lapses in judgment, and a few too many concessions to Catholics, Protestant zealots rose up against him, and he was ultimately executed. To avoid over-characterizing royal prerogative, Hume occasionally condemns arbitrary actions of monarchs and praises efforts for preserving liberty. Nevertheless, Whig critics like Gilbert Stuart argued that Hume’s emphasis was decisively in favor of prerogative.

There is an irony to Hume’s preference for prerogative over civil liberty. His philosophical writings were among the most controversial pieces of literature of the time, and would have been impossible to publish if Britain was not a friend to liberty. Although Hume was certainly no enemy to liberty, he believed that it was best achieved through moderation rather than Whig radicalism. He writes, “If any other rule than established practice be followed, factions and dissentions must multiply without end” (History, Appendix 3). To Hume’s way of thinking, the loudest voices favoring liberty were Calvinistic religious fanatics who accomplished little more than dissention. A strong, centralized and moderating force was the best way to avoid factious disruption from the start.

10. References and Further Reading

a. Recent Editions of Hume’s Writings

There are many published editions of Hume’s writings, the best of which are as follows (listed chronologically).

The Philosophical Works of David Hume (1874-1875), ed. T.H. Green and T.H. Grose.
- This four-volume set was the definitive edition of the late nineteenth century, and is the text source of many individually published books on Hume. It does not include the History. Electronic versions of this edition are freely available on the internet.
Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion (1935), ed., Norman Kemp Smith.
- This is the definitive edition of this work, and contains a ground-breaking introductory essay.
Enquiries (Oxford, 1975) ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge and P.H. Nidditch.
- This contains Hume’s two Enquiries, and was the definitive edition of these works in the late twentieth-century.
Treatise of Human Nature (Oxford, 1978), ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge and P.H. Nidditch.
- This was the definitive edition of this work in the late twentieth-century.
History of England (Liberty Classics, 1983).
- This is the definitive edition of this work.
Essays, Moral, Political and Literary (Liberty Classics, 1987), ed. E.F. Miller.
- This is the definitive edition of this work.
The Clarendon Edition of the Works of David Hume (1998-ongoing), ed. Tom L. Beauchamp, Mark Box, David Fate Norton, Mary Norton, M.A. Stewart.
- This is a carefully-researched critical edition of Hume’s philosophical works, and supersedes all previous editions. Volumes on Hume’s Essays and the Dialogues are forthcoming; it does not include Hume’s History.

b. Chronological List of Hume’s Publications

A Treatise of Human Nature: Being an Attempt to Introduce the Experimental Method of Reasoning into Moral Subjects (1739-40).
- This was published anonymously in three volumes: Vol. I. Of the Understanding; Vol. II. Of the Passions. Vol. III. Of Morals. This is Hume’s principle philosophical work, the central notions of which were rewritten more popularly in Philosophical Essays Concerning Human Understanding (1748) and An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751).
An Abstract of a Book lately Published; entituled, A Treatise of Human Nature, &c. Wherein the chief Argument of that Book is farther Illustrated and Explained (1740).
- This is a sixteen page pamphlet, published anonymously as an effort to bring attention to the Treatise.
Essays, Moral and Political (1741-1742).
- This was published anonymously in two volumes in 1741 and 1742 respectively. In subsequent editions some essays were dropped and others added; the collection was eventually combined with his Political Discourses (1752) and retitled Essays, Moral, Political and Literary in Hume’s collection of philosophical works, Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects (1753).
A Letter from a Gentleman to his Friend in Edinburgh: Containing Some Observations on a Specimen of the Principles concerning Religion and Morality, said to be maintain’d in a Book lately publish’d, intituled, A Treatise of Human Nature, &c (1745).
- This thirty-four page pamphlet was published anonymously and was prompted by Hume’s candidacy for the Chair of Moral Philosophy at the University of Edinburgh. The pamphlet responds to criticisms regarding the Treatise.
Philosophical Essays Concerning Human Understanding. By the Author of the Essays Moral and Political (1748).
- This was published anonymously and later retitled Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. It is a popularized version of key themes that appear mainly in the Treatise, Book 1.
A True Account of the Behaviour and conduct of Archibald Stewart, Esq; late Lord Provost of Edinburgh. In a letter to a Friend (1748).
- This fifty-one page pamphlet was published anonymously as a defense of Archibald Stewart, Lord Provost of Edinburgh, surrounding a political controversy.
An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals. By David Hume, Esq. (1751).
- This is a popularized version of key themes that appear mainly in the Treatise, Book 3.
The Petition of the Grave and Venerable Bellmen (or Sextons) of the Church of Scotland (1751).
- This was published anonymously and involved the Church of Scotland’s efforts to increase their stipends.
Political discourses. By David Hume Esq. (1752).
- This is a collection of essays on economic and political subjects, which was eventually combined with his Essays Moral and Political (1741-1742) and retitled Essays, Moral, Political and Literary in Hume’s collection of philosophical works, Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects (1753).
Scotticisms (1752).
- This six page pamphlet was published anonymously, and lists Scottish idioms.
The History of England, from the Invasion of Julius Cæsar to the Revolution in 1688 (1754-1762).
- This was published in four installments: (a) The history of Great Britain. Vol. I. Containing the reigns of James I. and Charles I. By David Hume, Esq. (1754); (b) The history of Great Britain. Vol. II. Containing the Commonwealth, and the reigns of Charles II. and James II. By David Hume, Esq. (1757); (c) The history of England, under the House of Tudor Comprehending the reigns of K. Henry VII. K. Henry VIII. K. Edward VI. Q. Mary, and Q. Elizabeth. . . . By David Hume, Esq (1759); (d) The history of England, from the invasion of Julius Cæsar to the accession of Henry VII. . . . By David Hume, Esq. (1762).
Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects. By David Hume, Esq; In four volumes (1753).
- This is Hume’s handpicked collection of philosophical works, which includes (a) Essays, Moral and Political, (b) Philosophical Essays concerning Human Understanding, (c) An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, and (d) Political Discourses. Essays from Four Dissertations (1757) were added to later editions. The collection does not include the Treatise.
Four Dissertations. I. The Natural History of Religion. II. Of the Passions. III. Of Tragedy. IV. Of the Standard of Taste. By David Hume, esq. (1757).
- This volume was originally to include “Of Suicide” and “Of the Immortality of the Soul,” which were removed at the last minute and appeared separately in 1783 in an unauthorized posthumous edition. The four essays in Four Dissertations were later added to various sections of Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects.
Letter to Critical Review, April 1759, Vol. 7. pp. 323-334.
- This is a defense of William Wilkie’s epic poem Epigoniad.
Exposé succinct de la contestation qui s’est élevée entre M. Hume et M. Rousseau, avec les pieces justificatives (1766).
- This is a pamphlet containing letters between Hume and Rousseau, published anonymously, translated from English by J.B.A. Suard. The pamphlet was translated back to English in A Concise and Genuine account of the Dispute between Mr. Hume and Mr. Rousseau: with the Letters that Passed Between them during their Controversy (1766).
Advertisement to Baron Manstein’s Memoirs of Russia, Historical, Political and Military, from MDCXXVII, to MDCXLIV (1770).
- This is an opening advertisement by Hume to Manstein’s work.
The Life of David Hume, Esq. Written by Himself (1777). This contains “My Own Life” and “Letter from Adam Smith, LL.D. to William Strahan, Esq.”
Dialogues Concerning Natural religion. By David Hume, Esq. (1779).
- This is a posthumous edition from Hume’s unpublished manuscript, and contains his most detailed attack on natural religion.
Essays on Suicide, and the Immortality of the Soul, ascribed to the late David Hume, Esq. Never before Published. With Remarks, intended as an Antidote to the Poison contained in these Performances, by the Editor. To which is added, Two Letters on Suicide, from Rosseau’s [sic] Eloisa (1783).
- This is an unauthorized publication of the two essays that were originally associated with Four Dissertations.

c. Biographies, Letters, Manuscripts

Burton, John Hill. Letters of Eminent Persons Addressed to David Hume: From the Papers Bequeathed by his Nephew to the Royal Society of Edinburgh. (1849).
- This book is a companion to collections of letters written by Hume, and contains letters written to Hume, which are preserved in the National Library of Scotland manuscript collection noted below.
Greig, J.Y.T. Letters of David Hume (1932), two volumes.
- This is the best collection of Hume’s letters (along with the supplementary volume by Klibansky below).
Greig, J.Y.T.; Beynon, Harold, eds. “Calendar of Hume MSS. in the possession of the Royal Society,” in Proceedings of the Royal Society of Edinburgh, 1931–1932, Vol. 52, pp. 1–138.
- This is a detailed list of the Hume manuscripts from National Library of Scotland manuscript collection, noted below. It includes a contents summary of each item, and was subsequently published separately in book.
Klibansky, Raymond; Mossner, Ernest. New Letters of David Hume (1954).
- This volume of letters is a supplement to Greig’s two volume collection above.
Waldmann, Felix. Further Letters of David Hume (2014).
- This volume contains newly discovered letters.
Mossner, E.C. The Life of David Hume (Oxford, 1980).
- This is the best biography of Hume.
National Library of Scotland (MS no. 23151–23163).
- This manuscript deposit contains thirteen large volumes assembled from papers collected by Hume’s family after his death. It includes around 150 letters by Hume, 525 letters to him, and several manuscripts of published and unpublished works, most importantly the manuscript of his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. This is the manuscript collection indexed by Greig and Beynon above.

d. Bibliographies

“The Hume Literature,” Hume Studies, 1977-present.
- Each year Hume Studies publishes an annual bibliographical update; these bibliographies exclude articles that appear in Hume Studies itself.
“An Index of Hume Studies: 1975-1993.” Hume Studies 19.2 (1993).
- This is a bibliographical index of articles that have appeared in Hume Studies since the journal’s inception until 1993.
Fieser, James. A Bibliography of Hume’s Writings and Early Responses (2005).
- This is a bibliography of Hume’s writings and eighteenth and nineteenth-century responses. It is freely available on the internet.
Hall, Rolland. Fifty Years of Hume Scholarship: A Bibliographic Guide (1978).
- This bibliography covers from 1925 through 1976, and is continued by the annual Hume bibliographies in Hume Studies.
Jessop, Thomas Edmund. A bibliography of David Hume and of Scottish philosophy from Francis Hutcheson to Lord Balfour (1938).
- This is the first published scholarly bibliographical work on Hume, early responses to Hume, and other Scottish philosophers.
Tweyman, Stanley. Secondary Sources on the Philosophy of David Hume: A David Hume Bibliography in Two Volumes, 1741-2005 (2006).

e. Works on Hume

The secondary literature on Hume is voluminous. Below are a few works that cover all aspects of Hume’s philosophy. For works on specific aspects of Hume, such as his epistemology, see other IEP articles on Hume.

Ayer, A.J. Hume (1980).
- This is a short but informative introduction by a great twentieth-century philosopher who sees himself as following in the Humean tradition.
Blackburn, Simon. How to Read Hume (2008).
- This is a concise work on various aspects of Hume’s philosophy.
Fieser, James. Early Responses to Hume’s Writings (London: Continuum, 2005), 10 volumes.
- This contains the principal eighteenth and nineteenth-century criticisms of Hume, and is freely available on the internet.
Kemp Smith, Norman. The Philosophy of David Hume (1941).
- This groundbreaking book set a new direction for Hume scholarship.
Hume Studies, 1977-present.
- This journal is devoted to Hume scholarship, and most of the volumes are freely accessible on the Hume Studies web site.
Jones, Peter, ed. The Reception of David Hume in Europe. London, New York: Thoemmes Continuum, 2005.
- This work contains chapters by different writers on Hume’s impact in different European countries.
Norton, David Fate; Taylor, Jacqueline. The Cambridge Companion to Hume (2008).
- This contains essays by different writers on various aspects of Hume’s philosophy.
Stroud, Barry. Hume (1981).
- This is an influential analytic discussion of various problems that arise within Hume’s philosophy.

Author Information

James Fieser
Email: jfieser@utm.edu
University of Tennessee at Martin
U. S. A.

Lambda Calculi

Lambda calculi (λ-calculi) are formal systems describing functions and function application. One of them, the untyped version, is often referred to as the λ-calculus. This exposition will adopt this convention. At its core, the λ-calculus is a formal language with certain reduction rules intended to capture the notion of function application [Church, 1932, p. 352]. Through the primitive notion of function application, the λ-calculus also serves as a prototypical programming language. The philosophical significance of the calculus comes from the expressive power of a seemingly simple formal system. The λ-calculus is in fact a family of formal systems, all stemming from the same common root. The variety and expressiveness of these calculi yield results in formal logic, recursive function theory, the foundations of mathematics, and programming language theory. After a discussion of the history of the λ-calculus, we will explore the expressiveness of the untyped λ-calculus. Then we will investigate the role of the untyped lambda calculus in providing a negative answer to Hilbert’s Entscheidungsproblem and in forming the Church-Turing thesis. After this, we will take a brief foray into typed λ-calculi and discuss the Curry-Howard isomorphism, which provides a correspondence between these calculi (which again are prototypical programming languages) and systems of natural deduction.

History
1. Main Developments
2. Notes
The Untyped Lambda Calculus
Expressiveness
Philosophical Importance
Types and Programming Languages
1. Overview
2. Notes
References and Further Reading

1. History

a. Main Developments

Alonzo Church first introduced the λ-calculus as “A set of postulates for the foundation of logic” in two papers of that title published in 1932 and 1933. Church believed that “the entities of formal logic are abstractions, invented because of their use in describing and systematizing facts of experience or observation, and their properties, determined in rough outline by this intended use, depend for their exact character on the arbitrary choice of the inventor” [Church, 1932, p. 348]. The intended use of the formal system Church developed was, as mentioned in the introduction, function application. Intuitively, the expression (later called a term) λx.x² corresponds to an anonymous definition of the mathematical function f(x) = x². An “anonymous definition” of a function refers to a function defined without a name; in the current case, instead of defining a function “f”, an anonymous definition corresponds to the mathematician’s style of defining a function as a mapping, such as “x ↦ x²”. Do note that the operation of squaring is not yet explicitly defined in the λ-calculus. Later, it will be shown how it can be. For our present purposes, the use of squaring is pedagogical. By limiting the use of free variables and the law of excluded middle in his system in certain ways, Church hoped to escape paradoxes of transfinite set theory [Church, 1932, p. 346–8]. The original formal system of 1932–1933 turned out, however, not to be consistent. In it, Church defined many symbols besides function definition and application: a two-place predicate for extensional equality, an existential quantifier, negation, conjunction, and the unique solution of a function. In 1935, Church’s students Kleene and Rosser, using this full range of symbols and Gödel’s method of representing the syntax of a language numerically so that a system can express statements about itself, proved that any formula is provable in Church’s original system. In 1935, Church isolated the portion of his formal system dealing solely with functions and proved the consistency of this system. One idiosyncratic feature of the system of 1935 was eliminated in Church’s 1936b paper, which introduced what is now known as the untyped λ-calculus. This 1936 paper also provides the first exposition of the Church-Turing thesis and a negative answer to Hilbert’s famous problem of determining whether a given formula in a formal system is provable. We will discuss these results later.

b. Notes

For a thorough history of the λ-calculus, including many modern developments, with a plethora of pointers to primary and secondary literature, see Cardone and Hindley [2006]. Church [1932] is very accessible and provides some insight into Church’s thinking about formal logic in general. Though the inconsistency proof of Kleene and Rosser [1935] is a formidable argument, the first page of their paper provides an overview of their proof strategy which should be comprehensible to anyone with some mathematical/logical background and rough understanding of the arithmetization of syntax á la Gödel. According to Barendregt [1997], Church originally intended to use the notation ˆx.x². His original typesetter could not typeset this, and so moved the hat in front of the x, which another typesetter than read as λx.x². In an unpublished letter, Church writes that he placed the hat in front, not a typesetter. According to Cardone and Hindley [2006, p. 7], Church later contradicted his earlier account, telling enquirers that he was in need of a symbol and just happened to pick λ.

2. The Untyped Lambda Calculus

At its most basic level, the λ-calculus is a formal system with a concrete syntax and distinct reduction rules. In order to proceed properly, we must define the alphabet and syntax of our language and then the rules for forming and manipulating well-formed formulas in this language. In the process of this exposition, formal definitions will be given along with informal description of the intuitive meaning behind the expressions.

a. Syntax

The language of the λ-calculus consists of the symbols (, ), λ and a countably infinite set of variables x, y, z, … We use upper-case variables M, N, … to refer to formulas of the λ-calculus. These are not symbols in the calculus itself, but rather convenient metalinguistic abbreviations. The terms (formulas, expressions; these three will be used interchangeably) of the calculus are defined inductively as follows:

x is a term for any variable.
If M, N are terms, then (MN) is a term.
If x is a variable and M a term, then (λx.M) is a term.

The latter two rules of term formation bear most of the meat. The second bullet corresponds to function application. The last bullet is called “abstraction” and corresponds to function definition. Intuitively, the notation λx.M corresponds to the mathematical notation of an anonymous function x ↦ M. As you can see from this language definition, everything is a function. The functions in this language can “return” other functions and accept other functions as their input. For this reason, they are often referred to as higher-order functions or first-class functions in programming language theory. We provide a few examples of λ terms before examining evaluation rules and the expressive power of this simple language.

λx.x: this represents the identity function, which just returns its argument.
λf.(λx.(fx)): this function takes in two arguments and applies the first to the second.
λf.(λx.(f(xx)))(λx.(f(xx))): this term is called a “fixed-point combinator” and usually denoted by Y. We will discuss its importance later, but introduce it here to show how more complex terms can be built.

Though I referred to the second term above as accepting two arguments, this is actually not the case. Every function in the λ-calculus takes only one argument as its input (as can be seen by a quick examination of the language definition). We will see later, however, that this does not in any way restrict us and that we can often think of nested abstractions as accepting multiple arguments. Before we proceed, a few notational conventions should be mentioned:

We always drop the outermost parentheses. This was already adopted in the three examples above.
Application associates to the left: (MNP) is shorthand for ((MN)P).
Conversely, abstraction associates to the right: (λx.λy.M) is short for (λx.(λy.M))
We can drop λs from repeated abstractions: λx.λy.M can be written λxy.M and similarly for any length sequence of abstractions.

b. Substitution

Because it will play a pivotal role in determining the equivalence between λ-terms, we must define a notion of variable substitution. This depends on the notion of free and bound variables, which we will define only informally. In a term λx.P, x is a bound variable, as are similarly bound variables in the subterm P; variables which are not bound are free. In other words, free variables are those that occur outside the scope of a λ abstraction on that variable. A term containing no free variables is called a combinator. We can then define the substitution of N for x in term M, denoted M[x := N], as follows:

x[x := N] = N
y[x := N] = y (provided that x is a variable different than y)
(PQ)[x := N] = P[x := N]Q[x := N]
(λx.P)[x := N] = λx.P
(λy.P)[x := N] = λy.P[x := N] (provided that x is different than y and y is not free in N or x is not free in P)

Intuitively, these substitution rules allow us to replace all the free occurrences of a variable (x) with any term (N). We cannot replace the bound occurrences of the variable (or allow for a variable to become bound by a substitution, as accounted for in the last rule) because that would change the “meaning” of the term. The scare quotes are included because the formal semantics of the λ-calculus falls beyond the scope of the present article.

c. `α`-equivalence

The α-equivalence relation, denoted ≡_α, captures the idea that two terms are equivalent up to a change of bound variables. For instance, though I referred to λx.x as “the” identity function earlier, we also want to think of λy.y, λz.z, et cetera as identity functions. We can define α-equivalence formally as follows:

x ≡_α x
MN ≡_α PQ if M ≡_α P and N ≡_α Q
λx.M ≡_α λx.N (provided that M ≡_α N)
λx.M ≡_α λy.M[x := y] (provided that y is not free in M)

It will then follow as a theorem that ≡_α is an equivalence relation. It should therefore be noted that what was defined earlier as a λ-term is in fact properly called a pre-term. Equipped with the notion of α-equivalence, we can then define a λ-term as the α-equivalence class of a pre-term. This allows us to say that λx.x and λy.y are in fact the same term since they are α-equivalent.

d. β-equivalence

β-reduction, denoted →_β, is the principle rewriting rule in the λ-calculus. It captures the intuitive notion of function application. So, for instance, (λx.x)M →_β M, which is what we would expect from an identity function. Formally, →_β is the least relation of λ-terms satisfying:

If M →_β N then λx.M →_β λx.N
If M →_β N then MZ →_β NZ for any terms M, N, Z
If M →_β N then ZM →_β ZN for any terms M, N, Z
(λx.M)N →_β M[x := N]

The first three conditions define what’s referred to as a compatible relation. →_β is then the least compatible relation of terms satisfying the fourth condition, which encodes the notion of function application as variable substitution. We will use the symbol ↠_β to denote the iterated (zero or more times) application of →_β and =_β to denote the smallest equivalence relation containing →_β. Two terms M and N are said to be convertible when M =_αβ N (=_αβ refers to the union of =_α and =_β). A term of the form (λx.M)N is called a β-redux (or just a redux) because it can be reduced to M[x := N]. A term M is said to be in β-normal form (henceforth referred to simply as normal form) iff there is no term N such that M →_β N. That is to say that a term M is in normal form iff M contains no β-redexes. A term M is called normalizing (or weakly normalizing) iff there is an N in normal form such that M ↠_β N. A term M is strongly normalizing if every β-reduction sequence starting with M is finite. A term which is not normalizing is called divergent. Regarding β-reduction as the execution of a program, this definition says that divergent programs never terminate since normal form terms correspond to terminated programs. Although we do not prove the result here, it is worth nothing that the untyped λ-calculus is neither normalizing nor strongly normalizing. For instance, Y as defined earlier does not normalize. The interested reader may try an exercise: show that Y →_β Y₁ →_β Y₂ →_β Y₃ →_β …, where Y_i ≠ Y_j for all i ≠ j. Iterated β reduction allows us to express functions of multiple variables in a language that only has one-argument functions. Consider the example before of the term λf.λx.(fx). Letting F, X denote arbitrary terms, we can evaluate:

(`λf`.(`λx`.(`fx`)))`FX`	→_β (`λx`.(`fx`)[`f` := `F`])`X`
	→_β (`Fx`)[`x` := `X`]
	= `FX`

This result is exactly what we expected. The process of treating a function of multiple arguments as iterated single-argument functions is generally referred to as Currying. Moreover, ↠_β satisfies an important property known either as confluence or as the Church-Rosser property. For any term M, if M ↠_β M₁ and M ↠_β M₂, then there exists a term M₃ such that M₁ ↠_β M₃ and M₂ ↠_β M₃. Although a proof of this statement requires machinery that lies beyond the scope of the present exposition, it is both an important property and one that is weaker than either normalization or strong normalization. In other words, although the untyped λ-calculus is neither normalizing nor strongly normalizing, it does satisfy the Church-Rosser property.

e. `η`-equivalence

Another common notion of reduction is →_η which is the least compatible relation (i.e. a relation satisfying the first three items in the definition of →_β) such that

λx.Mx →_η M (provided that x is not free in M)

As before, =_η is the least equivalence relation containing →_η. The notion of η-equivalence captures the idea of extensionality, which can be broadly stated as the fact that two objects (of whatever kind) are equal if they share all their external properties, even if they may differ on internal properties. (The notion of external and internal properties used here is meant to be intuitive only.) η-equivalence is a kind of extensionality statement for the untyped λ-calculus because it states that any function is equal to the function which takes an argument and applies the original function to this argument. In other words, two functions are equivalent when they yield the same output on the same input. This assumption is an extensionality one because it ignores any differences in how the two functions compute that output.

f. Notes

In its original formulation, Church allowed abstraction to occur only over free variables in the body of the function. While this makes intuitive sense (i.e. the body of the function should depend on its input), the requirement does not change any properties of the calculus and has generally been dropped. Barendregt [1984] is the most thorough work on the untyped λ-calculus. It is also very formal and potentially impenetrable to a new reader. Introductions with learning curves that are not quite as steep include Hindley and Seldin [2008] and Hankin [2004]. The first chapter of Sørensen and Urzyczyn [2006] contains a quick, concise tour through the material, with some intuitive motivation. Other less formal expositions include the entry on Wikipedia and assorted unpublished lecture notes to be found on the web. Not every aspect of the untyped λ-calculus was covered in this section. Moreover, notions such as η-equivalence and the Church-Rosser property were introduced only briefly. These are important philosophically. For more discussion and elaboration on the important technical results, the interested reader can learn more from the above cited sources. We also omit any discussion of the formal semantics of the untyped λ-calculus, originally developed in the 1960s by Dana Scott and Christopher Strachey. Again, Barendregt’s book contains a formal exposition of this material and extensive pointers to further reading on it.

3. Expressiveness

Though the language and reduction rules of the untyped λ-calculus may at first glance appear somewhat limiting, we will see in this section how expressive the calculus can be. Because everything is a function, our general strategy will be to define some particular terms to represent common objects like booleans and numbers and then show that certain other terms properly codify functions of booleans and numbers in the sense that they β reduce as one would expect. Instead, however, of continuing these general remarks, the methodology will be used in the particular cases of booleans and natural numbers. Throughout this exposition, bold face will be used to name particular terms.

a. Booleans

We first introduce the basic definitions:

true	= `λxy`.`x`
false	= `λxy`.`y`

In other words, true is a function of two arguments which returns its first argument and false is one which returns the second argument. To see how these two basic definitions can be used to encode the behavior of the booleans, we first introduce the following definition:

ifthenelse

= λxyz.xyz

The statement ifthenelse PQR should be read as “if P then Q else R”. It should also be noted that ifthenelse PQR ↠_β PQR; often times, only this reduct is presented as standing for the linguistic expression quoted above. Note that ifthenelse actually captures the desired notion. When P = true, we have that

ifthenelse true `QR`	↠_β true `QR`
	= (`λxy`.`x`)`QR`
	→_β (`λy`.`Q`)`R`
	→_β `Q`

An identical argument will show that ifthenelse false QR ↠_β R. The above considerations will also hold for any P such that P ↠_β true or P ↠_β false. We will now show how a particular boolean connective (and) can be encoded in the λ-calculus and then list some further examples, leaving it to the reader to verify their correctness. We define

and

= λpq.pqp

To see this definition’s adequacy, we can manually check the four possible truth-values of the “propositional variables” p and q. Although any λ-term can serve as an argument for a boolean function, these functions encode the truth tables of the connectives in the sense that they behave as one would expect when acting on boolean expressions.

and true true	= (`λpq`.`pqp`)(`λxy`.`x`)(`λxy`.`x`)
	→_β (`λq`.`pqp`)[`p` := (`λxy`.`x`)](`λxy`.`x`)
	= (`λq`.((`λxy`.`x`)`q`(`λxy`.`x`)))(`λxy`.`x`)
	→_β ((`λxy`.`x`)`q`(`λxy`.`x`))[`q` := `λxy`.`x`]
	= (`λxy`.`x`)(`λxy`.`x`)(`λxy`.`x`)
	↠_β `λxy`.`x`
	= true

Similarly, we see that

and true false	= (`λpq`.`pqp`)(`λxy`.`x`)(`λxy`.`y`)
	→_β (`λq`.`pqp`)[`p` := (`λxy`.`x`)](`λxy`.`y`)
	= (`λq`.((`λxy`.`x`)`q`(`λxy`.`x`)))(`λxy`.`y`)
	→_β (`λxy`.`x`) (`λxy`.`y`)(`λxy`.`x`)
	↠_β `λxy`.`y`
	= false

We leave it to the reader to verify that and false true ↠_β false and that and false false ↠_β false. Together, these results imply that our definition of and encodes the truth table for “and” just as we would expect it to do. The following list of connectives similarly encode their respective truth tables. Because we think it fruitful for the reader to work out the details to gain a fuller understanding, we simply list these without examples:

or	= `λpq`.`ppq`
not	= `λpxy`.`pyx`
xor	= `λpq`.`p`(`q` false true)`q`

b. Church Numerals

At the very end of his 1933 paper, Church introduced an encoding for numbers in the untyped λ-calculus that allows arithmetic to be carried out in this purely functional setting. Because the ramifications were not fully explored until his 1936 paper, we hold off on discussion of the import of this encoding and focus here on an exposition of the ability of the λ-calculus to compute functions of natural numbers. The numerals are defined as follows:

1	= `λab`.`ab`
2	= `λab`.`a`(`ab`)
3	= `λab`.`a`(`a`(`ab`))
	⁝

Successor, addition, multiplication, predecessor, and subtraction can also be defined as follows:

succ	= `λnab`.`a`(`nab`)
plus	= `λmnab`.`ma`(`nab`)
mult	= `λmna`.`n`(`ma`)
pred	= `λnab`.`n`(`λgh`.`h`(`ga`))(`λu`.`b`)(`λu`.`u`)
minus	= `λmn`.(`n` pred)`m`

As in the case of the booleans, an example of using the successor and addition functions will help show how these definitions functionally capture arithmetic.

succ 1	= (`λnab`.`a`(`nab`))(`λab`.`ab`)
	→_β (`λab`.`a`(`nab`))[`n` := (`λab`.`ab`)]
	= `λab`.`a`((`λab`.`ab`)`ab`)
(`λab`.`ab`)`ab`	→_β ((`λb`.`ab`)[`a` := `a`])`b`
	= (`λb`.`ab`)`b`
	→_β `ab`
`λab`.`a`((`λab`.`ab`)`ab`)	→_β `λab`.`a`(`ab`)
	= 2

Similarly, an example of addition:

plus 1 2	= (`λmnab`.`ma`(`nab`))(`λab`.`ab`)(`λab`.`a`(`ab`))
(`λmnab`.`ma`(`nab`)) 1 2	→_β ((`λnab`.`ma`(`nab`))[`m` := `λab`.`ab`])2
	= (`λnab`.(`λab`.`ab`)`a`(`nab`))2
	→_β (`λab`.(`λab`.`ab`)`a`(`nab`))[`n` := `λab`.`a`(`ab`)]
	= `λab`.(`λab`.`ab`)`a`((`λab`.`a`(`ab`))`ab`)
(`λab`.`ab`)`a`	→_β `λb`.`ab`
(`λab`.`a`(`ab`))`ab`	→_β (`λb`.`a`(`ab`))`b`
	→_β `a`(`ab`)
`λab`.1`a`(2`ab`)	→_β `λab`.`a`(`a`(`ab`))
	= 3

Seeing as how these examples capture the appropriate function on natural numbers in terms of Church numerals, we can introduce the notion of λ-definability in the way that Church did in 1936. A function f of one natural number is said to be λ-definable if it is possible to find a term f such that if f(m) = r, then fm ↠_β r, where m and r are the Church numerals of m and r. The arithmetical functions defined above clearly fit this description. The astute reader may have anticipated the result, proved in Kleene [1936], that the λ-definable functions coincide exactly with partial recursive functions. This quite remarkable result encapsulates the arithmetical expressiveness of the untyped λ-calculus completely. While the import of the result will be discussed in section 4, I will briefly discuss how fixed-point combinators allow recursive functions to be encoded in the λ-calculus. Recall that a combinator is a term with no free variables. A combinator M is called a fixed-point combinator if for every term N, we have that MN =_β N(MN). In particular, Y as defined before, is a fixed point combinator, since

Y`F`	≡ (`λf`. (`λx`.`f`(`xx`))(`λx`.`f`(`xx`)))`F`
	→_β (`λx`.`F`(`xx`))(`λx`.`F`(`xx`))
	→_β `F`(`xx`)[`x` := `λx`.`F`(`xx`)]
	≡ `F`((`λx`.`F`(`xx`))(`λx`.`F`(`xx`)))
	=_β `F`(Y`F`)

Although the technical development of the result lies outside the scope of the present exposition, one must note that fixed-point combinators allow the minimization operator to be defined in the λ-calculus. Therefore, all (partial) recursive functions on natural numbers—not just the primitive recursive ones (which are a proper subset of the partial recursive functions)—can be encoded in the λ-calculus.

c. Notes

In the exposition of booleans, connectives such as and, or, et cetera, were given in a very general formulation. They can also be defined more concretely in terms of true and false in a manner that may be closer to capturing their truth tables. For instance, one may define and = λpq.p(q true false) false and verify that it also captures the truth table properly even though it does not directly β-reduce to the definition presented above. In the 1933 paper, Church defined plus, mult, and minus somewhat differently than presented here. This original exposition used some of the idiosyncrasies of the early version of the λ-calculus that were dropped by the time of the 1936 paper. The predecessor function was originally defined by Kleene, in a story which will be discussed in section 4. In addition to the original Kleene paper, more modern expositions of the result that the partial recursive functions are co-extensive with the λ-definable functions can be found in Sørensen and Urzyczyn [2006, pp. 20–22] and Barendregt [1984, pp. 135–139], among others.

4. Philosophical Importance

The expressiveness of the λ-calculus has allowed it to play a critical role in debates at the foundations of mathematics, logic and programming languages. At the end of the introduction to his 1936 paper, Church writes that “The purpose of the present paper is to propose a definition of effective calculability which is thought to correspond satisfactorily to the somewhat vague intuitive notion in terms of which problems of this class are often stated, and to show, by means of an example, that not every problem of this class is solvable.” The first subsection below will explore the definition of effective calculability in terms of λ-definability. We will then explore the second purpose of the 1936 paper, namely that of proving a negative answer to Hilbert’s Entscheidungsproblem. In the course of both of these expositions, connections will be made with the work of other influential logicians (Gödel and Turing) of the time. Finally, we will conclude with a brief foray into more modern developments in typed λ-calculi and the correspondence between them and logical proofs, a correspondence often referred to as “proofs-as-programs” for reasons that will become clear.

a. The Church-Turing Thesis

In his 1936 paper, in a section entitled “The notion of effective calculability”, Church writes that “We now define the notion, already discussed, of an effectively calculable function of positive integers by identifying it with the notion of a recursive function of positive integers (or a λ-definable function of positive integers)” [Church, 1936b, p. 356, emphasis in original]. The most striking feature of this definition, which will be discussed in more depth in what follows, is that it defines an intuitive notion (effective calculability) with a formal notion. In this sense, some regard the thesis as more of an unverifiable hypothesis than a definition. In what follows, we will consider, in addition to the development of alternative formulations of the thesis, what qualifies as evidence in support of this thesis. In the preceding parts of Church’s paper, he claims to have shown that for any λ-definable function, there exists an algorithm for calculating its values. The idea of an algorithm existing to calculate the values of a function (F) plays a pivotal role in Church’s thesis. Church argues that an effectively calculable function of one natural number must have an algorithm, consisting in a series of expressions (“steps” in the algorithm) that lead to the calculated result. Then, because each of these expressions can be represented as a natural number using Gödel’s methodology, the functions that act on them to calculate F will be recursive and therefore F will be as well. In short, a function which has an algorithm that calculates its values will be effectively calculable and any effectively calculable function of one natural number has such an algorithm. Furthermore, if such an algorithm exists, it will be λ-definable (via the formal result that all recursive functions are λ-definable). Church offers a second notion of effective calculability in terms of provability within an arbitrary logical system. Because he can show that this notion also coincides with recursiveness, he concludes that “no more general definition of effective calculability than that proposed above can be obtained by either of the two methods which naturally suggest themselves” [Church, 1936b, p. 358]. The history of this particular version of the thesis has no clear story. Kleene allegedly realized how to define the predecessor function (as given in the previous section: Kleene had earlier defined the predecessor function using an encoding of numerals different from those of Church) while at the dentist for the removal of two wisdom teeth. For a first-hand account, see Crossley [1975, pp. 4–5]. According to Barendregt [1997, p. 186]:

After Kleene showed the solution to his teacher, Church remarked something like: “But then all intuitively computable functions must be lambda definable. In fact, lambda definability must coincide with intuitive computability.” Many years later—it was at the occasion of Robin Gandy’s 70th birthday, I believe—I heard Kleene say: “I would like to be able to say that, at the moment of discovering how to lambda define the predecessor function, I got the idea of Church’s Thesis. But I did not, Church did.”

Alan Turing, in his groundbreaking paper also published in 1936, developed the notion of computable numbers in terms of his computing machines. While Turing believes that any definition of an intuitive notion will be “rather unsatisfactory mathematically,” he frames the question in terms of computation as opposed to effective calculability: “The real question at issue is ‘what are the possible processes which can be carried out in computing a number?’ ” [Turing, 1937a, p. 249] By analyzing the way that a computer—in fact, an idealized human computer—would use a piece of paper to carry out this process of computing a number, which he reduces to observing a finite number of squares on a one-dimensional paper and changing one of the squares or another within a small distance of the currently observed squares, Turing shows how this intuitive notion of computing can be captured by one of his machines. Thus, he claims to have captured the intuitive notion of computability with computability by Turing machines. In the appendix of this paper added later, Turing also offers a sketch of a proof that λ-definability and his computability capture the same class of functions. In a subsequent paper, he also suggests that “The identification of ‘effectively calculable’ functions with computable functions is possibly more convincing than an identification with the λ-definable or general recursive functions” [Turing, 1937b, p. 153]. While Turing may believe that his machines are closer to the intuitive notion of calculating a number, the fact that the three classes of functions are identical means they can be used interchangeably. This fact has often been considered to count as evidence that these formalisms do in fact capture an intuitive notion of calculability. Because Turing’s analysis of the notion of computability often makes reference to a human computer, with squares on paper referred to as “states of mind”, the Church-Turing thesis, along with Turing’s result that there is a universal machine which can compute any function that any Turing machine can, has often been interpreted, in conjunction with the computational theory of mind, as having profound results on the limits of human thought. For a detailed analysis of many misinterpretations of the thesis and what it does imply in the context of the nature of mind, see Copeland [2010].

b. An Answer to Hilbert’s Entscheidungsproblem

In a famous lecture addressed at the meeting of the International Congress of Mathematicians in 1900, David Hilbert proposed 23 problems in need of solution. The second of these was to give a proof of the consistency of analysis without reducing it to a consistency proof of another system. Though much of Hilbert’s thought and the particular phrasing of this problem changed over the ensuing 30 years, the challenge to prove the consistency of certain formal systems remained. At a 1928 conference, Hilbert posed three problems that continued his general program. The third of these problems was the Entscheidungsproblem in the sense that Church used the term: “By the Entscheidungsproblem of a system of symbolic logic is here understood the problem to find an effective method by which, given any expression Q in the notation of the system, it can be determined whether or not Q is provable in the system” [Church, 1936a, p. 41]. In 1936b, Church used the λ-calculus to prove a negative solution to this problem for a wide/natural/interesting class of formal systems. The technical result proved in this paper is that it is undecidable, given two λ-terms A and B whether A is convertible into B. Church argues that any system of logic that is strong enough to express a certain amount of arithmetic will be able to express the formula ψ(a, b), which encodes that a and b are the Gödel numbers of A and B such that A is convertible into B. If the system of logic satisfied the Entscheidungsproblem, then it would be decidable for every a, b whether ψ(a, b) is provable; but this would provide a way to decide whether A is convertible into B for any terms A and B, contradicting Church’s already proven result that this problem is not decidable. Given that we have just seen the equivalence between Turing machine computability and λ-definability, it should come as no surprise that Turing also provided a negative solution to the Entscheidungsproblem. Turing proceeds by defining a formula of one variable which takes as input the complete description of a Turing machine and is provable if and only if the machine input ever halts. Therefore, if the Entscheidungsproblem can be solved, then it provides a method for proving whether or not a given machine halts. But Turing had shown earlier that this halting problem cannot be solved. These two results, in light of the Church-Turing Thesis, imply that there are functions of natural numbers that are not effectively calculable/computable. It remains open, however, whether there are computing machines or physical processes that elude the limitations of Turing computability (equivalently, λ-definability) and whether or not the human brain may embody one such process. For a thorough discussion of computation in physical systems and the resulting implications for philosophy of mind, see Piccinini [2007].

c. Notes

Kleene [1952] offers (in chapters 12 and 13) a detailed account of the development of the Church-Turing thesis from a figure who was central to the logical developments involved. Turing’s strategy of reducing the Entscheudingsproblem to the halting problem has been adopted by many researchers tackling other problems. Kleene [1952] also discusses Turing computability. The halting problem, as outlined above, however, takes an arbitrary machine and an arbitrary input. There are, of course, particular machines and particular inputs for which it can be decided whether the machine halts on that input. For instance, every finite-state automaton halts on every input.

5. Types and Programming Languages

a. Overview

In 1940, Church gave a “formulation of the simple theory of types which incorporates certain features of λ-conversion” [Church, 1940, p. 56]. Though the history of simple types extends beyond the scope of this paper and Church’s original formulation extended beyond the syntax of the untyped λ-calculus (in a way somewhat similar to the original, inconsistent formulation), one can intuitively think of types as syntactic decorations that restrict the formation of terms so that functions may only be applied to appropriate arguments. In informal mathematics, a function f : ℕ → ℕ cannot be applied to a fraction. We now define a set of types and a new notion of term that incorporates this idea. We have a set of base types, say σ₁, σ₂. (In Church’s formulation, ι and o were the only base types. In many programming languages, base types include things such as nat, bool, etc. This set can be countably infinite for the purposes of proof although no programming language could implement such a type system.) For any types α, β, then α → β is also a type. (Church used the notation (βα), but the arrow is used in most modern expositions because it captures the intuition of a function type better.) In what follows, σ, τ and any other lower-case Greek letters will range over types. We will write either e : τ or e^τ to indicate that term e is of type τ. The simply typed terms can then be defined as follows:

x^β is a term.
If x^β is a variable and M^α is a term, then (λx^β.M^α)^β^→^α is a term.
If M^α^→^β and N^α are terms, then (MN)^β is a term.

While the first two rules can be seen as simply adding “syntactic decoration” to the original untyped terms, this third rule captures the idea of only applying functions to proper input. It can be read as saying: If M is a function from α to β and N is an α, then MN is a β. This formal system does not permit other application terms to be formed. One must note that this simply-typed λ-calculus is strongly normalizing, meaning that any well-typed term has a finite reduction sequence. It has been mentioned that λ-calculi are prototypical programming languages. We can then think of typed λ-calculi as being typed programming languages. Seen in this light, the strongly normalizing property states that one cannot write a non-terminating program. For instance, the term Y in the untyped λ-calculus has no simply-typed equivalent. Clearly, then, this is a somewhat restrictive language. Because of this property and the results in the preceding section, it follows that the simply-typed λ-calculus is not Turing complete, i.e. there are λ-definable functions which are not definable in the simply-typed version. Taking this analogy with programming languages literally, we can interpret a family of results collectively known as the Curry-Howard correspondence as providing a “proofs-as-programs” metaphor. (The correspondence is sometimes referred to as Curry-Howard-Lambek due to Lambek’s work in expressing both the λ-calculus and natural deduction in a category-theoretic setting.) In the case of the simply-typed λ-calculus, the correspondence is between the λ-calculus and the implicational fragment of intuitionistic natural deduction. One can readily see that simple types correspond directly to propositions in this fragment of propositional logic (modulo a translation of base types to propositional variables). The correspondence then states that a proposition is provable if and only if there is a λ-term with the type of the proposition. The term then corresponds to a proof of the proposition. In the simply-typed case, the correspondence can be fleshed out as:

`λ`-calculus	propositional logic
type	proposition
term	proof
abstraction	arrow introduction
application	modus ponens
variables	assumptions

Table 1. Curry-Howard in the simply-typed λ-calculus.

For example, consider the intuitionistic tautology p → ¬¬p, where ¬p =_df p → ⊥. While a full exposition of natural deduction for intuitionistic propositional logic lies beyond the present scope, observe that we have the following proof of p → ¬¬p = p → ((p → ⊥) → ⊥):

p, p → ⊥ ⊢ p → ⊥ p, p → ⊥ ⊢ p p, p → ⊥ ⊢ ⊥ p ⊢ (p → ⊥) → ⊥ ⊢ p → ((p → ⊥) → ⊥)

We can then follow this proof in order to construct a corresponding term in the simply-typed λ-calculus as follows:

x^p, y^p^→⊥ ⊢ y^p^→⊥ x^p, y^p^→⊥ ⊢ x^p x^p, y^p^→⊥ ⊢ yx^⊥ x^p ⊢ (λy^p^→⊥.yx^⊥)⁽^p^{→⊥)→⊥} ⊢ (λx^p.λy^p^→⊥.yx^⊥)^p^→((^p^{→⊥)→⊥)}

As was mentioned, the Curry-Howard correspondence is not one correspondence, but rather a family. The main idea is that terms correspond to proofs of their type. In the way that we can extend logics beyond the implicational fragment of intuitionistic propositional logic to include things like connectives, negation, quantifiers, and higher-order logic, so too can we extend the syntax and type systems of λ-calculus. There are thus many variations of the proofs-as-programs correspondence. See the following notes section for many sources exploring the development of more complex correspondences. That programs represent proofs is more than an intellectual delight: it is the correspondence on which software verifiers and automated mathematical theorem provers (such as Automath, HOL, Isabelle, and Coq) are based. These tools both verify and help users generate proofs and have in fact been used to develop proofs of unproven conjectures.

b. Notes

For a thorough exposition of typed λ-calculi, starting with simple types and progressing through all faces of the “λ-cube”, see Barendregt [1992]. Sørensen and Urzyczyn [2006] explores the Curry-Howard correspondence between many different forms of logic and the corresponding type systems. Pierce [2002] focuses on the λ-calculus and its relation to programming languages, thoroughly developing calculi from the simple to the very complex, along with type checking and operational semantics for each.

6. References and Further Reading

Barendregt, Henk. 1984. The Lambda Calculus: Its Syntax and Semantics. Elsevier Science, Amsterdam.
Barendregt, Henk. 1992. Lambda Calculi with Types. Oxford University Press, Oxford.
Barendregt, Henk. 1997. “The Impact of the Lambda Calculus in Logic and Computer Science.” The Bulletin of Symbolic Logic 3(2):181–215.
Cardone, Felice and J. R. Hindley. 2006. Handbook of the History of Logic, eds., D. M. Gabbay and J. Woods, vol. 5., History of Lambda-Calculus and Combinatory Logic, Elsevier.
Church, Alonzo. 1932. “A Set of Postulates for the Foundation of Logic (Part I).” Annals of Mathematics, 33(2):346–366.
Church, Alonzo. 1933. “A Set of Postulates for the Foundation of Logic (Part II).” Annals of Mathematics, 34(4):839–864.
Church, Alonzo. 1935. “A Proof of Freedom from Contradiction.” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the United States of America, 21(5):275–281.
Church, Alonzo. 1936a. “A Note on the Entscheidungsproblem.” Journal of Symbolic Logic, 1(1):40–41.
Church, Alonzo. 1936b. “An Unsolvable Problem of Elementary Number Theory.” American Journal of Mathematics, 58(2):345–363, 1936b.
Church, Alonzo. 1940. “A Formulation of the Simple Theory of Types.” Journal of Symbolic Logic, 5(2):56–68.
Church, Alonzo. 1941. The Calculi of Lambda Conversion. Princeton University Press, Princeton, NJ.
Copeland, B. Jack. 2010. “The Church-Turing Thesis.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Crossley, J. N. 1975. “Reminiscences of Logicians.” Algebra and Logic: Papers from the 1974 Summer Research Institute of the Australian Mathematical Society, Monash University, Australia, Lecture Notes in Mathematics, vol. 450, Springer, Berlin.
Hankin, Chris. 2004. An Introduction to Lambda Calculi for Computer Scientists. College Publications.
Hindley, J. Roger and Jonathan P. Seldin. 2008. Lambda-Calculus and Combinators: An Introduction. Cambridge University Press, Cambridge.
Kleene, S. C. 1936. “λ-definability and Recursiveness.” Duke Mathematical Journal, 2(2):340–353.
Kleene, S. C. 1952. Introduction to Metamathematics. D. van Norstrand, New York.
Kleene, S. C. and J. B. Rosser. 1935. “The Inconsistency of Certain Formal Logics.” Annals of Mathematics, 36(3):630–636.
Piccinini, Gualtiero. 2007. “Computational Modelling vs. Computational Explanation: Is Everything a Turing Machine, and Does It Matter to the Philosophy of Mind?” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 85(1):93–115.
Pierce, Benjamin C. 2002. Types and Programming Languages. MIT Press, Cambridge.
Sørensen, M. H. and P. Urzyczyn. 2006. Lectures on the Curry-Howard Isomorphism. Elsevier Science, Oxford.
Turing, Alan M. 1937a. “On Computable Numbers, with an Application to the Entscheidungsproblem.” Proceedings of the London Mathematical Society, 42(2):230–265.
Turing, Alan M. 1937b. “Computability and λ-Definability.” Journal of Symbolic Logic, 2(4): 153–163.

Author Information

Shane Steinert-Threlkeld
Email: shanest@stanford.edu
Stanford University
U. S. A.

Plato: Phaedo

The Phaedo is one of the most widely read dialogues written by the ancient Greek philosopher Plato. It claims to recount the events and conversations that occurred on the day that Plato’s teacher, Socrates (469-399 B.C.E.), was put to death by the state of Athens. It is the final episode in the series of dialogues recounting Socrates’ trial and death. The earlier Euthyphro dialogue portrayed Socrates in discussion outside the court where he was to be prosecuted on charges of impiety and corrupting the youth; the Apology described his defense before the Athenian jury; and the Crito described a conversation during his subsequent imprisonment. The Phaedo now brings things to a close by describing the moments in the prison cell leading up to Socrates’ death from poisoning by use of hemlock.

Among these “trial and death” dialogues, the Phaedo is unique in that it presents Plato’s own metaphysical, psychological, and epistemological views; thus it belongs to Plato’s middle period rather than with his earlier works detailing Socrates’ conversations regarding ethics. Known to ancient commentators by the title On the Soul, the dialogue presents no less than four arguments for the soul’s immortality. It also contains discussions of Plato’s doctrine of knowledge as recollection, his account of the soul’s relationship to the body, and his views about causality and scientific explanation. Most importantly of all, Plato sets forth his most distinctive philosophical theory—the theory of Forms—for what is arguably the first time. So, the Phaedo merges Plato’s own philosophical worldview with an enduring portrait of Socrates in the hours leading up to his death.

The Place of the Phaedo within Plato’s works
Drama and Doctrine
Outline of the Dialogue
References and Further Reading

1. The Place of the Phaedo within Plato’s works

Plato wrote approximately thirty dialogues. The Phaedo is usually placed at the beginning of his “middle” period, which contains his own distinctive views about the nature of knowledge, reality, and the soul, as well as the implications of these views for human ethical and political life. Its middle-period classification puts it after “early” dialogues such as the Apology, Euthyphro, Crito, Protagoras, and others which present Socrates’ search—usually inconclusive—for ethical definitions, and before “late” dialogues like the Parmenides, Theaetetus, Sophist, and Statesman. Within the middle dialogues, it is uncontroversial that the Phaedo was written before the Republic, and most scholars think it belongs before the Symposium as well. Thus, in addition to being an account of what Socrates said and did on the day he died, the Phaedo contains what is probably Plato’s first overall statement of his own philosophy. His most famous theory, the theory of Forms, is presented in four different places in the dialogue.

2. Drama and Doctrine

In addition to its central role in conveying Plato’s philosophy, the Phaedo is widely agreed to be a masterpiece of ancient Greek literature. Besides philosophical argumentation, it contains a narrative framing device that resembles the chorus in Greek tragedy, references to the Greek myth of Theseus and the fables of Aesop, Plato’s own original myth about the afterlife, and in its opening and closing pages, a moving portrait of Socrates in the hours leading up to his death. Plato draws attention (at 59b) to the fact that he himself was not present during the events retold, suggesting that he wants the dialogue to be seen as work of fiction.

Contemporary commentators have struggled to put together the dialogue’s dramatic components with its lengthy sections of philosophical argumentation—most importantly, with the four arguments for the soul’s immortality, which tend to strike even Plato’s charitable interpreters as being in need of further defense. (Socrates himself challenges his listeners to provide such defense at 84c-d.) How seriously does Plato take these arguments, and what does the surrounding context contribute to our understanding of them? While this article will concentrate on the philosophical aspects of the Phaedo, readers are advised to pay close attention to the interwoven dramatic features as well.

3. Outline of the Dialogue

The dialogue revolves around the topic of death and immortality: how the philosopher is supposed to relate to death, and what we can expect to happen to our souls after we die. The text can be divided, rather unevenly, into five sections:

(1) an initial discussion of the philosopher and death (59c-69e)

(2) three arguments for the soul’s immortality (69e-84b)

(3) some objections to these arguments from Socrates’ interlocutors and his response, which includes a fourth argument (84c-107b)

(4) a myth about the afterlife (107c-115a)

(5) a description of the final moments of Socrates’ life (115a-118a)

The dialogue commences with a conversation (57a-59c) between two characters, Echecrates and Phaedo, occurring sometime after Socrates’ death in the Greek city of Phlius. The former asks the latter, who was present on that day, to recount what took place. Phaedo begins by explaining why some time had elapsed between Socrates’ trial and his execution: the Athenians had sent their annual religious mission to Delos the day before the trial, and executions are forbidden until the mission returns. He also lists the friends who were present and describes their mood as “an unaccustomed mixture of pleasure and pain,” since Socrates appeared happy and without fear but his friends knew that he was going to die. He agrees to tell the whole story from the beginning; within this story the main interlocutors are Socrates, Simmias, and Cebes. Some commentators on the dialogue have taken the latter two characters to be followers of the philosopher Pythagoras (570-490 B.C).

a. The Philosopher and Death (59c-69e)

Socrates’ friends learn that he will die on the present day, since the mission from Delos has returned. They go in to the prison to find Socrates with his wife Xanthippe and their baby, who are then sent away. Socrates, rubbing the place on his leg where his just removed bonds had been, remarks on how strange it is that a man cannot have both pleasure and pain at the same time, yet when he pursues and catches one, he is sure to meet with the other as well. Cebes asks Socrates about the poetry he is said to have begun writing, since Evenus (a Sophist teacher, not present) was wondering about this. Socrates relates how certain dreams have caused him to do so, and says that he is presently putting Aesop’s fables into verse. He then asks Cebes to convey to Evenus his farewell, and to tell him that—even though it would be wrong to take his own life—he, like any philosopher, should be prepared to follow Socrates to his death.

Here the conversation turns toward an examination of the philosopher’s attitude toward death. The discussion starts with the question of suicide. If philosophers are so willing to die, asks Cebes, why is it wrong for them to kill themselves? Socrates’ initial answer is that the gods are our guardians, and that they will be angry if one of their possessions kills itself without permission. As Cebes and Simmias immediately point out, however, this appears to contradict his earlier claim that the philosopher should be willing to die: for what truly wise man would want to leave the service of the best of all masters, the gods?

In reply to their objection, Socrates offers to “make a defense” of his view, as if he were in court, and submits that he hopes this defense will be more convincing to them than it was to the jury. (He is referring here, of course, to his defense at his trial, which is recounted in Plato’s Apology.) The thesis to be supported is a generalized version of his earlier advice to Evenus: that “the one aim of those who practice philosophy in the proper manner is to practice for dying and death” (64a3-4).

Socrates begins his defense of this thesis, which takes up the remainder of the present section, by defining death as the separation of body and soul. This definition goes unchallenged by his interlocutors, as does its dualistic assumption that body and soul are two distinct entities. (The Greek word psuchē is only roughly approximate to our word “soul”; the Greeks thought of psuchē as what makes something alive, and Aristotle talks about non-human animals and even plants as having souls in this sense.) Granted that death is a soul/body separation, Socrates sets forth a number of reasons why philosophers are prepared for such an event. First, the true philosopher despises bodily pleasures such as food, drink, and sex, so he more than anyone else wants to free himself from his body (64d-65a). Additionally, since the bodily senses are inaccurate and deceptive, the philosopher’s search for knowledge is most successful when the soul is “most by itself.”

The latter point holds especially for the objects of philosophical knowledge that Plato later on in the dialogue (103e) refers to as “Forms.” Here Forms are mentioned for what is perhaps the first time in Plato’s dialogues: the Just itself, the Beautiful, and the Good; Bigness, Health, and Strength; and “in a word, the reality of all other things, that which each of them essentially is” (65d). They are best approached not by sense perception but by pure thought alone. These entities are granted again without argument by Simmias and Cebes, and are discussed in more detail later. .

All told, then, the body is a constant impediment to philosophers in their search for truth: “It fills us with wants, desires, fears, all sorts of illusions and much nonsense, so that, as it is said, in truth and in fact no thought of any kind ever comes to us from the body” (66c). To have pure knowledge, therefore, philosophers must escape from the influence of the body as much as is possible in this life. Philosophy itself is, in fact, a kind of “training for dying” (67e), a purification of the philosopher’s soul from its bodily attachment.

Thus, Socrates concludes, it would be unreasonable for a philosopher to fear death, since upon dying he is most likely to obtain the wisdom which he has been seeking his whole life. Both the philosopher’s courage in the face of death and his moderation with respect to bodily pleasures which result from the pursuit of wisdom stand in stark contrast to the courage and moderation practiced by ordinary people. (Wisdom, courage, and moderation are key virtues in Plato’s writings, and are included in his definition of justice in the Republic.) Ordinary people are only brave in regard to some things because they fear even worse things happening, and only moderate in relation to some pleasures because they want to be immoderate with respect to others. But this is only “an illusory appearance of virtue”—for as it happens, “moderation and courage and justice are a purging away of all such things, and wisdom itself is a kind of cleansing or purification” (69b-c). Since Socrates counts himself among these philosophers, why wouldn’t he be prepared to meet death? Thus ends his defense.

b. Three Arguments for the Soul’s Immortality (69e-84b)

But what about those, says Cebes, who believe that the soul is destroyed when a person dies? To persuade them that it continues to exist on its own will require some compelling argument. Readers should note several important features of Cebes’ brief objection (70a-b). First, he presents the belief in the immortality of the soul as an uncommon belief (“men find it hard to believe . . .”). Secondly, he identifies two things which need to be demonstrated in order to convince those who are skeptical: (a) that the soul continues to exist after a person’s death, and (b) that it still possesses intelligence. The first argument that Socrates deploys appears to be intended to respond to (a), and the second to (b).

i. The Cyclical Argument (70c-72e)

Socrates mentions an ancient theory holding that just as the souls of the dead in the underworld come from those living in this world, the living souls come back from those of the dead (70c-d). He uses this theory as the inspiration for his first argument, which may be reconstructed as follows:

1. All things come to be from their opposite states: for example, something that comes to be “larger” must necessarily have been “smaller” before (70e-71a).

2. Between every pair of opposite states there are two opposite processes: for example, between the pair “smaller” and “larger” there are the processes “increase” and “decrease” (71b).

3. If the two opposite processes did not balance each other out, everything would eventually be in the same state: for example, if increase did not balance out decrease, everything would keep becoming smaller and smaller (72b).

4. Since “being alive” and “being dead” are opposite states, and “dying” and “coming-to-life” are the two opposite processes between these states, coming-to-life must balance out dying (71c-e).

5. Therefore, everything that dies must come back to life again (72a).

A main question that arises in regard to this argument is what Socrates means by “opposites.” We can see at least two different ways in which this term is used in reference to the opposed states he mentions. In a first sense, it is used for “comparatives” such as larger and smaller (and also the pairs weaker/stronger and swifter/slower at 71a), opposites which admit of various degrees and which even may be present in the same object at once (on this latter point, see 102b-c). However, Socrates also refers to “being alive” and “being dead” as opposites—but this pair is rather different from comparative states such as larger and smaller, since something can’t be deader, but only dead. Being alive and being dead are what logicians call “contraries” (as opposed to “contradictories,” such as “alive” and “not-alive,” which exclude any third possibility). With this terminology in mind, some contemporary commentators have maintained that the argument relies on covertly shifting between these different kinds of opposites.

Clever readers may notice other apparent difficulties as well. Does the principle about balance in (3), for instance, necessarily apply to living things? Couldn’t all life simply cease to exist at some point, without returning? Moreover, how does Plato account for adding new living souls to the human population? While these questions are perhaps not unanswerable from the point of view of the present argument, we should keep in mind that Socrates has several arguments remaining, and he later suggests that this first one should be seen as complementing the second (77c-d).

ii. The Argument from Recollection (72e-78b)

Cebes mentions that the soul’s immortality also is supported by Socrates’ theory that learning is “recollection” (a theory which is, by most accounts, distinctively Platonic, and one that plays a role in his dialogues Meno and Phaedrus as well). As evidence of this theory he mentions instances in which people can “recollect” answers to questions they did not previously appear to possess when this knowledge is elicited from them using the proper methods. This is likely a reference to the Meno (82b ff.), where Socrates elicits knowledge about basic geometry from a slave-boy by asking the latter a series of questions to guide him in the right direction. Asked by Simmias to elaborate further upon this doctrine, Socrates explains that recollection occurs “when a man sees or hears or in some other way perceives one thing and not only knows that thing but also thinks of another thing of which the knowledge is not the same but different . . .” (73c). For example, when a lover sees his beloved’s lyre, the image of his beloved comes into his mind as well, even though the lyre and the beloved are two distinct things.

Based on this theory, Socrates now commences a second proof for the soul’s immortality—one which is referred to with approval in later passages in the dialogue (77a-b, 87a, 91e-92a, and 92d-e). The argument may be reconstructed as follows:

1. Things in the world which appear to be equal in measurement are in fact deficient in the equality they possess (74b, d-e).

2. Therefore, they are not the same as true equality, that is, “the Equal itself” (74c).

3. When we see the deficiency of the examples of equality, it helps us to think of, or “recollect,” the Equal itself (74c-d).

4. In order to do this, we must have had some prior knowledge of the Equal itself (74d-e).

5. Since this knowledge does not come from sense-perception, we must have acquired it before we acquired sense-perception, that is, before we were born (75b ff.).

6. Therefore, our souls must have existed before we were born. (76d-e)

With regard to premise (1), in what respect are this-worldly instances of equality deficient? Socrates mentions that two apparently equal sticks, for example, “fall short” of true equality and are thus “inferior” to it (74e). Why? His reasoning at 74b8-9—that the sticks “sometimes, while remaining the same, appear to one to be equal and another to be unequal”—is notoriously ambiguous, and has been the subject of much scrutiny. He could mean that the sticks may appear as equal or unequal to different observers, or perhaps they appear as equal when measured against one thing but not another. In any case, the notion that the sensible world is imperfect is a standard view of the middle dialogues (see Republic 479b-c for a similar example), and is emphasized further in his next argument.

By “true equality” and “the Equal itself” in premises (2)-(4), Socrates is referring to the Form of Equality. It is this entity with respect to which the sensible instances of equality fall short—and indeed, Socrates says that the Form is “something else beyond all these.” His brief argument at 74a-c that true equality is something altogether distinct from any visible instances of equality is of considerable interest, since it is one of few places in the middle dialogues where he makes an explicit argument for why there must be Forms. The conclusion of the second argument for the soul’s immortality extends what has been said about equality to other Forms as well: “If those realities we are always talking about exist, the Beautiful and the Good and all that kind of reality, and we refer all the things we perceive to that reality, discovering that it existed before and is ours, and we compare these things with it, then, just as they exist, so our soul must exist before we are born” (76d-e). The process of recollection is initiated not just when we see imperfectly equal things, then, but when we see things that appear to be beautiful or good as well; experience of all such things inspires us to recollect the relevant Forms. Moreover, if these Forms are never available to us in our sensory experience, we must have learned them even before we were capable of having such experience.

Simmias agrees with the argument so far, but says that this still does not prove that our souls exist after death, but only before birth. This difficulty, Socrates suggests, can be resolved by combining the present argument with the one from opposites: the soul comes to life from out of death, so it cannot avoid existing after death as well. He does not elaborate on this suggestion, however, and instead proceeds to offer a third argument.

iii. The Affinity Argument (78b-84b)

The third argument for the soul’s immortality is referred to by commentators as the “affinity argument,” since it turns on the idea that the soul has a likeness to a higher level of reality:

1. There are two kinds of existences: (a) the visible world that we perceive with our senses, which is human, mortal, composite, unintelligible, and always changing, and (b) the invisible world of Forms that we can access solely with our minds, which is divine, deathless, intelligible, non-composite, and always the same (78c-79a, 80b).

2. The soul is more like world (b), whereas the body is more like world (a) (79b-e).

3. Therefore, supposing it has been freed of bodily influence through philosophical training, the soul is most likely to make its way to world (b) when the body dies (80d-81a). (If, however, the soul is polluted by bodily influence, it likely will stay bound to world (a) upon death (81b-82b).)

Note that this argument is intended to establish only the probability of the soul’s continued existence after the death of the body—“what kind of thing,” Socrates asks at the outset, “is likely to be scattered [after the death of the body]?” (78b; my italics) Further, premise (2) appears to rest on an analogy between the soul and body and the two kinds of realities mentioned in (1), a style of argument that Simmias will criticize later (85e ff.). Indeed, since Plato himself appends several pages of objections by Socrates’ interlocutors to this argument, one might wonder how authoritative he takes it to be.

Yet Socrates’ reasoning about the soul at 78c-79a states an important feature of Plato’s middle period metaphysics, sometimes referred to as his “two-world theory.” In this picture of reality, the world perceived by the senses is set against the world of Forms, with each world being populated by fundamentally different kinds of entities:

The World of the Senses	The World of Forms
Composites (that is, things with parts)	Non-composites
Things that never remain the same from one moment to the next	Things that always remain the same and don’t tolerate any change
Any particular thing that is equal, beautiful, and so forth	The Equal, the Beautiful, and what each thing is in itself
That which is visible	That which is grasped by the mind and invisible

Since the body is like one world and the soul like the other, it would be strange to think that even though the body lasts for some time after a person’s death, the soul immediately dissolves and exists no further. Given the respective affinities of the body and soul, Socrates spends the rest of the argument (roughly 80d-84b) expanding on the earlier point (from his “defense”) that philosophers should focus on the latter. This section has some similarities to the myth about the afterlife, which he narrates near the dialogue’s end; note that some of the details of the account here of what happens after death are characterized as merely “likely.” A soul which is purified of bodily things, Socrates says, will make its way to the divine when the body dies, whereas an impure soul retains its share in the visible after death, becoming a wandering phantom. Of the impure souls, those who have been immoderate will later become donkeys or similar animals, the unjust will become wolves or hawks, those with only ordinary non-philosophical virtue will become social creatures such as bees or ants.

The philosopher, on the other hand, will join the company of the gods. For philosophy brings deliverance from bodily imprisonment, persuading the soul “to trust only itself and whatever reality, existing by itself, the soul by itself understands, and not to consider as true whatever it examines by other means, for this is different in different circumstances and is sensible and visible, whereas what the soul itself sees is intelligible and indivisible” (83a6-b4). The philosopher thus avoids the “greatest and most extreme evil” that comes from the senses: that of violent pleasures and pains which deceive one into thinking that what causes them is genuine. Hence, after death, his soul will join with that to which it is akin, namely, the divine.

c. Objections from Simmias and Cebes, and Socrates’ Response (84c-107b)

After a long silence, Socrates tells Simmias and Cebes not to worry about objecting to any of what he has just said. For he, like the swan that sings beautifully before it dies, is dedicated to the service of Apollo, and thus filled with a gift of prophecy that makes him hopeful for what death will bring.

i. The Objections (85c-88c)

Simmias prefaces his objection by making a remark about methodology. While certainty, he says, is either impossible or difficult, it would show a weak spirit not to make a complete investigation. If at the end of this investigation one fails to find the truth, one should adopt the best theory and cling to it like a raft, either until one dies or comes upon something sturdier.

This being said, he proceeds to challenge Socrates’ third argument. For one might put forth a similar argument which claims that the soul is like a harmony and the body is like a lyre and its strings. In fact, Simmias claims that “we really do suppose the soul to be something of this kind,” that is, a harmony or proper mixture of bodily elements like the hot and cold or dry and moist (86b-c). (Some commentators think the “we” here refers to followers of Pythagoras.) But even though a musical harmony is invisible and akin to the divine, it will cease to exist when the lyre is destroyed. Following the soul-as-harmony thesis, the same would be true of the soul when the body dies.

Next Socrates asks if Cebes has any objections. The latter says that he is convinced by Socrates’ argument that the soul exists before birth, but still doubts whether it continues to exist after death. In support of his doubt, he invokes a metaphor of his own. Suppose someone were to say that since a man lasts longer than his cloak, it follows that if the cloak is still there the man must be there too. We would certainly think this statement was nonsense. (He appears to be refering to Socrates’ argument at 80c-e here.) Just as a man might wear out many cloaks before he dies, the soul might use up many bodies before it dies. So even supposing everything else is granted, if “one does not further agree that the soul is not damaged by its many births and is not, in the end, altogether destroyed in one of those deaths, he might say that no one knows which death and dissolution of the body brings about the destruction of the soul, since not one of us can be aware of this” (88a-b). In light of this uncertainty, one should always face death with fear.

ii. Interlude on Misology (89b-91c)

After a short exchange in the meta-dialogue in which Phaedo and Echecrates praise Socrates’ pleasant attitude throughout this discussion, Socrates begins his response with a warning that they not become misologues. Misology, he says, arises in much the same way that misanthropy does: when someone with little experience puts his trust in another person, but later finds him to be unreliable, his first reaction is to blame this on the depraved nature of people in general. If he had more knowledge and experience, however, he would not be so quick to make this leap, for he would realize that most people fall somewhere in between the extremes of good and bad, and he merely happened to encounter someone at one end of the spectrum. A similar caution applies to arguments. If someone thinks a particular argument is sound, but later finds out that it is not, his first inclination will be to think that all arguments are unsound; yet instead of blaming arguments in general and coming to hate reasonable discussion, we should blame our own lack of skill and experience.

iii. Response to Simmias (91e-95a)

Socrates then puts forth three counter-arguments to Simmias’ objection. To begin, he gets both Simmias and Cebes to agree that the theory of recollection is true. But if this is so, then Simmias is not able to “harmonize” his view that the soul is a harmony dependent on the body with the recollection view that the soul exists before birth. Simmias admits this inconsistency, and says that he in fact prefers the theory of recollection to the other view. Nonetheless, Socrates proceeds to make two additional points. First, if the soul is a harmony, he contends, it can have no share in the disharmony of wickedness. But this implies that all souls are equally good. Second, if the soul is never out of tune with its component parts (as shown at 93a), then it seems like it could never oppose these parts. But in fact it does the opposite, “ruling over all the elements of which one says it is composed, opposing nearly all of them throughout life, directing all their ways, inflicting harsh and painful punishment on them, . . . holding converse with desires and passions and fears, as if it were one thing talking to a different one . . .” (94c9-d5). A passage in Homer, wherein Odysseus beats his breast and orders his heart to endure, strengthens this picture of the opposition between soul and bodily emotions. Given these counter-arguments, Simmias agrees that the soul-as-harmony thesis cannot be correct.

iv. Response to Cebes (95a-107b)

1. Socrates’ Intellectual History (96a-102a)

After summarizing Cebes’ objection that the soul may outlast the body yet not be immortal, Socrates says that this problem requires “a thorough investigation of the cause of generation and destruction” (96a; the Greek word aitia, translated as “cause,” has the more general meaning of “explanation”). He now proceeds to relate his own examinations into this subject, recalling in turn his youthful puzzlement about the topic, his initial attraction to a solution given by the philosopher Anaxagoras (500-428 B.C.), and finally his development of his own method of explanation involving Forms. It is debated whether this account is meant to describe Socrates’ intellectual autobiography or Plato’s own, since the theory of Forms generally is described as the latter’s distinctive contribution. (Some commentators have suggested that it may be neither, but instead just good storytelling on Plato’s part.)

When Socrates was young, he says, he was excited by natural science, and wanted to know the explanation of everything from how living things are nourished to how things occur in the heavens and on earth. But then he realized that he had no ability for such investigations, since they caused him to unlearn many of the things he thought he had previously known. He used to think, for instance, that people grew larger by various kinds of external nourishment combining with the appropriate parts of our bodies, for example, by food adding flesh to flesh. But what is it which makes one person larger than another? Or for that matter, which makes one and one add up to two? It seems like it can’t be simply the two things coming near one another. Because of puzzles like these, Socrates is now forced to admit his ignorance: “I do not any longer persuade myself that I know why a unit or anything else comes to be, or perishes or exists by the old method of investigation, and I do not accept it, but I have a confused method of my own” (97b).

This method came about as follows. One day after his initial setbacks Socrates happened to hear of Anaxagoras’ view that Mind directs and causes all things. He took this to mean that everything was arranged for the best. Therefore, if one wanted to know the explanation of something, one only had to know what was best for that thing. Suppose, for instance, that Socrates wanted to know why the heavenly bodies move the way they do. Anaxagoras would show him how this was the best possible way for each of them to be. And once he had taught Socrates what the best was for each thing individually, he then would explain the overall good that they all share in common. Yet upon studying Anaxagoras further, Socrates found these expectations disappointed. It turned out that Anaxagoras did not talk about Mind as cause at all, but rather about air and ether and other mechanistic explanations. For Socrates, however, this sort of explanation was simply unacceptable:

To call those things causes is too absurd. If someone said that without bones and sinews and all such things, I should not be able to do what I decided, he would be right, but surely to say that they are the cause of what I do, and not that I have chosen the best course, even though I act with my mind, is to speak very lazily and carelessly. Imagine not being able to distinguish the real cause from that without which the cause would not be able to act as a cause. (99a-b)

Frustrated at finding a teacher who would provide a teleological explanation of these phenomena, Socrates settled for what he refers to as his “second voyage” (99d). This new method consists in taking what seems to him to be the most convincing theory—the theory of Forms—as his basic hypothesis, and judging everything else in accordance with it. In other words, he assumes the existence of the Beautiful, the Good, and so on, and employs them as explanations for all the other things. If something is beautiful, for instance, the “safe answer” he now offers for what makes it such is “the presence of,” or “sharing in,” the Beautiful (100d). Socrates does not go into any detail here about the relationship between the Form and object that shares in it, but only claims that “all beautiful things are beautiful by the Beautiful” (100d). In regard to the phenomena that puzzled him as a young man, he offers the same answer. What makes a big thing big, or a bigger thing bigger, is the Form Bigness. Similarly, if one and one are said to be two, it is because they share in Twoness, whereas previously each shared in Oneness.

2. The Final Argument (102b-107b)

When Socrates has finished describing this method, both Simmias and Cebes agree that what he has said is true. Their accord with his view is echoed in another brief interlude by Echecrates and Phaedo, in which the former says that Socrates has “made these things wonderfully clear to anyone of even the smallest intelligence,” and Phaedo adds that all those present agreed with Socrates as well. Returning again to the prison scene, Socrates now uses this as the basis of a fourth argument that the soul is immortal. One may reconstruct this argument as follows:

1. Nothing can become its opposite while still being itself: it either flees away or is destroyed at the approach of its opposite. (For example, “tallness” cannot become “shortness” while still being “tall.”) (102d-103a)

2. This is true not only of opposites, but in a similar way of things that contain opposites. (For example, “fire” and “snow” are not themselves opposites, but “fire” always brings “hot” with it, and “snow” always brings “cold” with it. So “fire” will not become “cold” without ceasing to be “fire,” nor will “snow” become “hot” without ceasing to be “snow.”) (103c-105b)

3. The “soul” always brings “life” with it. (105c-d)

4. Therefore “soul” will never admit the opposite of “life,” that is, “death,” without ceasing to be “soul.” (105d-e)

5. But what does not admit death is also indestructible. (105e-106d)

6. Therefore, the soul is indestructible. (106e-107a)

When someone objects that premise (1) contradicts his earlier statement (at 70d-71a) about opposites arising from one another, Socrates responds that then he was speaking of things with opposite properties, whereas here is talking about the opposites themselves. Careful readers will distinguish three different ontological items at issue in this passage:

(a) the thing (for example, Simmias) that participates in a Form (for example, that of Tallness), but can come to participate in the opposite Form (of Shortness) without thereby changing that which it is (namely, Simmias)

(b) the Form (for example, of Tallness), which cannot admit its opposite (Shortness)

(c) the Form-in-the-thing (for example, the tallness in Simmias), which cannot admit its opposite (shortness) without fleeing away of being destroyed

Premise (2) introduces another item:

(d) a kind of entity (for example, fire) that, even though it does not share the same name as a Form, always participates in that Form (for example, Hotness), and therefore always excludes the opposite Form (Coldness) wherever it (fire) exists

This new kind of entity puts Socrates beyond the “safe answer” given before (at 100d) about how a thing participates in a Form. His new, “more sophisticated answer” is to say that what makes a body hot is not heat—the safe answer—but rather an entity such as fire. In like manner, what makes a body sick is not sickness but fever, and what makes a number odd is not oddness but oneness (105b-c). Premise (3) then states that the soul is this sort of entity with respect to the Form of Life. And just as fire always brings the Form of Hotness and excludes that of Coldness, the soul will always bring the Form of Life with it and exclude its opposite.

However, one might wonder about premise (5). Even though fire, to return to Socrates’ example, does not admit Coldness, it still may be destroyed in the presence of something cold—indeed, this was one of the alternatives mentioned in premise (1). Similarly, might not the soul, while not admitting death, nonetheless be destroyed by its presence? Socrates tries to block this possibility by appealing to what he takes to be a widely shared assumption, namely, that what is deathless is also indestructible: “All would agree . . . that the god, and the Form of Life itself, and anything that is deathless, are never destroyed” (107d). For readers who do not agree that such items are deathless in the first place, however, this sort of appeal is unlikely to be acceptable.

Simmias, for his part, says he agrees with Socrates’ line of reasoning, although he admits that he may have misgivings about it later on. Socrates says that this is only because their hypotheses need clearer examination—but upon examination they will be found convincing.

d. The Myth about the Afterlife (107c-115a)

The issue of the immortality of the soul, Socrates says, has considerable implications for morality. If the soul is immortal, then we must worry about our souls not just in this life but for all time; if it is not, then there are no lasting consequences for those who are wicked. But in fact, the soul is immortal, as the previous arguments have shown, and Socrates now begins to describe what happens when it journeys to the underworld after the death of the body. The ensuing tale tells us of

(1) the judgment of the dead souls and their subsequent journey to the underworld (107d-108c)

(2) the shape of the earth and its regions (108c-113c)

(3) the punishment of the wicked and the reward of the pious philosophers (113d-114c)

Commentators commonly refer to this story as a “myth,” and Socrates himself describes it this way (using the Greek word muthos at 110b, which earlier on in the dialogue (61b) he has contrasted with logos, or “argument.”). Readers should be aware that for the Greeks myth did not have the negative connotations it often carries today, as when we say, for instance, that something is “just a myth” or when we distinguish myth from fact. While Plato’s relation to traditional Greek mythology is a complex one—see his critique of Homer and Hesiod in Republic Book II, for instance—he himself uses myths to bolster his doctrines not only in the Phaedo, but in dialogues such as the Gorgias, Republic, and Phaedrus as well.

At the end of his tale, Socrates says that what is important about his story is not its literal details, but rather that we “risk the belief” that “this, or something like this, is true about our souls and their dwelling places,” and repeat such a tale to ourselves as though it were an “incantation” (114d). Doing so will keep us in good spirits as we work to improve our souls in this life. The myth thus reinforces the dialogue’s recommendation of the practice of philosophy as care for one’s soul.

e. Socrates’ Death (115a-118a)

The depiction of Socrates’ death that closes the Phaedo is rich in dramatic detail. It also is complicated by a couple of difficult interpretative questions.

After Socrates has finished his tale about the afterlife, he says that it is time for him to prepare to take the hemlock poison required by his death sentence. When Crito asks him what his final instructions are for his burial, Socrates reminds him that what will remain with them after death is not Socrates himself, but rather just his body, and tells him that they can bury it however they want. Next he takes a bath—so that his corpse will not have to be cleaned post-mortem—and says farewell to his wife and three sons. Even the officer sent to carry out Socrates’ punishment is moved to tears at this point, and describes Socrates as “the noblest, the gentlest and the best man” who has ever been at the prison.

Crito tells Socrates that some condemned men put off taking the poison for as long as possible, in order to enjoy their last moments in feasting or sex. Socrates, however, asks for the poison to be brought immediately. He drinks it calmly and in good cheer, and chastises his friends for their weeping. When his legs begin to feel heavy, he lies down; the numbness in his body travels upward until eventually it reaches his heart.

Some contemporary scholars have challenged Plato’s description of hemlock-poisoning, arguing that in fact the symptoms would have been much more violent than the relatively gentle death he depicts. If these scholars are right, why does Plato depict the death scene the way he does? There is also a dispute about Socrates’ last words, which invoke a sacrificial offering made by the sick to the god of medicine: “Crito, we owe a cock to Asclepius; make this offering to him and do not forget.” Did Socrates view life as a kind of sickness?

4. References and Further Reading

a. General Commentaries

Bostock, D. Plato’s Phaedo. Oxford, 1986.
- In-depth yet accessible discussion of the dialogue’s arguments (does not include text of the Phaedo). Includes a helpful chapter on the theory of Forms.
Dorter, K. Plato’s Phaedo: An Interpretation. University of Toronto Press, 1982.
- Reading of the dialogue that combines both dramatic and doctrinal approaches (does not include text of the Phaedo).
Gallop, D. Plato: Phaedo. Oxford, 1975.
- English translation with separate commentary that focuses on the dialogue’s argumentation.
Hackforth, R. Plato’s Phaedo: Translated with an Introduction and Commentary. Cambridge, 1955.
- English translation with running commentary.
Rowe, C.J. Plato: Phaedo. Cambridge, 1993.
- Original Greek text (no English) with introduction and detailed textual commentary.

b. The Philosopher and Death (59c-69e)

Pakaluk, M. “Degrees of Separation in the ‘Phaedo.’” Phronesis 48 (2003) 89-115.
- Discusses Plato’s notion of the soul-body distinction at 63a-69e.
Warren, J. “Socratic Suicide.” The Journal of Hellenic Studies 121 (2001) 91-106.
- On the Platonic philosopher’s attitude toward suicide in the 61e-69e passage.
Weiss, R. “The Right Exchange: Phaedo 69a6-c3″. Ancient Philosophy 7 (1987) 57-66.
- Examines the notion that wisdom is the highest goal of the philosopher.

c. Three Arguments for the Soul’s Immortality (69e-84b)

Ackrill, J.L. “Anamnēsis in the Phaedo,” in E.N. Lee and A.P.D. Mourelatos (eds.) Exegesis and Argument: Studies in Greek Philosophy Presented to Gregory Vlastos. Assen, 1973. 177-95.
- On the theory of recollection (73c-75).
Apolloni, D. “Plato’s Affinity Argument for the Immortality of the Soul.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 34 (1996) 5-32.
- A study of the argument at 78b-80d.
Gallop, D. “Plato’s ‘Cyclical Argument’ Recycled.” Phronesis 27 (1982) 207-222.
- On the first argument for the soul’s immortality (69e-72e) and its relation to the other arguments.
Matthen, M. “Forms and Participants in Plato’s Phaedo.” Noûs 18:2 (1984) 281-297.
- Discusses Plato’s argument concerning equals at 74b7-c6.
Nehamas, A. “Plato on the Imperfection of the Sensible World,” in G. Fine, ed., Plato 1: Metaphysics and Epistemology. Oxford, 1999. 171-191.
- On Plato’s view of sensible particulars, especially at 72e-78b.

d. Objections from Simmias and Cebes, and Socrates’ Response (84c-107b)

Frede, D. “The Final Proof of the Immortality of the Soul in Plato’s Phaedo 102a-107a.” Phronesis 23 (1978) 27-41.
- A defense of Plato’s argument and examination of its underlying assumptions regarding the soul.
Gottschalk, H.D. “Soul as Harmonia.” Phronesis 16 (1971) 179-198.
- Discusses Simmias’ account of the soul beginning at 85e.
Vlastos, G. “Reasons and Causes in the Phaedo,” in Plato: A Collection of Critical Essays, Vol. I: Metaphysics and Epistemology. Garden City, NY: Anchor Books, 1971.
- Are Forms causes? An examination of 95e-105c.
Wiggins, D. “Teleology and the Good in Plato’s Phaedo.” Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 4 (1986) 1-18.
- On Socrates’ “second voyage” beginning at 99c2-d1.

e. The Myth about the Afterlife (107c-115a)

Annas, J. “Plato’s Myths of Judgment.” Phronesis 27 (1982) 119-43.
- A study of Plato’s myths in the Gorgias, Phaedo, and Republic.
Morgan, K.A. Myth and Philosophy from the pre-Socratics to Plato. Cambridge, 2000.
- Includes extensive background on myth in Plato, as well as discussion of the Phaedo myth in particular.
Sedley, D. “Teleology and Myth in the Phaedo.” Proceedings of the Boston Area Colloquium in Ancient Philosophy 5 (1990) 359–83.

f. Socrates’ Death (115a-118a)

Crook, J. “Socrates’ Last Words: Another Look at an Ancient Riddle.” Classical Quarterly 48 (1998) 117-125.
- The papers by Crook and Most (cited below) consider some puzzles regarding Socrates’ final words at the dialogue’s end.
Gill, C. “The Death of Socrates.” Classical Quarterly 23 (1973) 25-25.
- On the finer details of hemlock-poisoning.
Most, G.W. “A Cock for Asclepius.” Classical Quarterly 43 (1993) 96-111.
Stewart, D. “Socrates’ Last Bath.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 10 (1972) 253-9.
- Looks at the deeper meaning of Socrates’ bath at 116a.
Wilson, E. The Death of Socrates. Harvard University Press, 2007.
- Includes discussion of the death scene in the Phaedo, as well as its subsequent reception in Western philosophy, art, and culture.

Author Information

Tim Connolly
Email: tconnolly@po-box.esu.edu
East Stroudsburg University
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Film: Continental Perspectives

This article introduces the most important perspectives on film (movies) from the continental philosophical perspective. “Continental” is not used as a geographical term, but as an abstract concept referring to nineteenth and twentieth century European philosophical traditions exemplified by German idealism, phenomenology, existentialism, hermeneutics, structuralism, post-structuralism, French feminism, and the Frankfurt School. The continental-friendly philosophy of film that has emerged in Anglophone countries since the 1980s also is taken into account in this article.

If one considers only contributions by well known philosophers, the philosophical output on film might appear relatively meager. Books that deal with the philosophy of film are equally rare. If, however, one considers the scholarly contributions from the entire field of humanities, specifically in the form of film aesthetics and film theory, the body of reflections on film inspired by philosophical ideas (in the most general sense) is impressive. Most of these works are linked to the European philosophical tradition of philosophy of film, which developed from the 1920s onward. Henri Bergson (1859-1941) was the first philosopher to show interest in film, though his influence on continental philosophy of film remained minor – though not inexistent – before the publication of Gilles Deleuze’s two volumes on cinema (1983 and 1985). In the 1980s, two French philosophers, Jean-Louis Schefer and Gilles Deleuze, decided to devote their attention to film studies. These studies began a continuous line of European philosophical works on film that stretched through to today’s writings by Jacques Rancière and Slavoj Žižek. In the English-speaking world, philosophical concepts entered the discourse on film at around the same time. Stanley Cavell’s work The World Viewed: Reflections on the Ontology of Film (1971) was a notable precursor of this tendency. In 1988, Noel Carroll published a critique of contemporary film theory (Mystifying Movies) which he criticized as being overly determined by Psycho-Semiotic Marxist paradigms. In the same year he published Philosophical Problems of Classical Film Theory that examined pre-semiotic theorists like Bazin and Arnheim in an analytical fashion.

Both representatives of the analytical and the continental tradition see thinkers that were active before the analytical-continental divide (for example, Münsterberg, Kracauer) as being central to their film studies; however, the interpretations of such thinkers differ considerably in both traditions.

A significant amount of continental work developed around the British journal Screen, which was very influential in the 1970s and has laid many of the foundations of Lacanian and neo-Marxist film theory.

Analytical philosophy of film has profited greatly from its rich tradition of analytical aesthetics. A significant part of this philosophy has attempted to push its studies in the direction of evidence-based scientific models. Continental thought has typically been inspired by the softer fields of humanities and has displayed a solid amount of political engagement. In the former Soviet Union, a complex discourse on the semiotics of film, inspired by a Russian formalist heritage that has a natural affinity with film, has made numerous philosophical statements.

What Is Philosophy Of Film?
An Overview Of Theories
References and Further Reading

1. What Is Philosophy Of Film?

Many studies of film do not necessarily claim a specific philosophical heritage, but can be considered as philosophical inasmuch as their approaches are methodologically sophisticated and transgress empiricism. Though it is very difficult to establish positive standards for what is ‘’philosophical’’ and what is not, it can be concurred that an approach is “philosophical” as soon as it uses references to philosophers and some abstract concepts that are not merely technical. A degree of argumentation and claim-making supported by reasons, some sort of evidence, and analysis or interpretation, on the other hand, are not particular to philosophy but are followed by all (human) sciences.

Film Theory

Para-philosophical studies have also been conveniently labelled as ‘film theory’. Strictly speaking, film theory, which develops concepts like ‘narrativity’, ‘diegesis’, ‘genre’ or ‘authorship’ is not a unique philosophy, but is very often part of it. Although parts of film theory and philosophy of film do overlap in both traditions (and since Münsterberg and Arnheim many film theorists have maintained that what they do is also related to the philosophy of film), it is wrong to characterize every “theoretical” reflection on film as philosophical because film theory can also be limited to the analysis of mere technicalities or textual analysis. Here, film theory is not different from literary theory where reflections on authorship or analyses of narrative and genre occur most typically without necessarily receiving the label “philosophy” unless they are imbedded in more “philosophical” considerations. The contemporary Anglophone philosophy of film sees this perspective slightly differently since longstanding reflections on these subjects (by Cavell, Carroll, Bordwell, Gaut, and Branigan) are usually classified as philosophy.

While the degrees of “philosophicality” vary within different interpretations of films, it is safe to assume that any reflective study of the nature of film is philosophical. Whenever scholars attempt to spell out what film is (Is film an art? How is film different from other arts?), their discourse becomes necessarily philosophical. This reflective study is not limited to film, but is true for any academic field (it becomes most obvious in philosophy of science).

Film Aesthetics

Philosophy of film cannot be seen only as a subfield of aesthetics or of the philosophy of art. Philosophy of film also should not be labeled as ‘film aesthetics’. Philosophy of film is able to approach a spectrum of questions so broad that its link with aesthetics can sometimes be maintained only by purely formal reasons. Bergson’s philosophy of film, which has attained a central position in contemporary philosophy of film, was not developed out of an aesthetic interest at all; but film would have served Bergson as merely an illustration for his general philosophical ideas. It is even possible to say that the philosophy of film, just because of its readiness to undertake paradoxical fusions that contrast aesthetics against fields other than aesthetics, develops a discourse that stands out in the entire body of philosophy. Treating, for example, psychoanalytical or cognitive problems as aesthetical phenomena bears an immense critical potential that does not exist to the same extent in other sub-disciplines of philosophy.

Film and Philosophy

Philos-sophia, the ancient Greek term for ‘’love of wisdom’’, can be understood as an immense attempt at interpreting or questioning human existence and the world in its entirety. Logically, film can be one of its subjects. When this is the case, the approach towards film usually exceeds the label of mere interpretation and places film in a relationship with classical philosophical questions such as (its own) essence, truth, or beauty.

Philos-sophia can see film as one of its subjects, but film can also be its object, that is, film can be a philosophy through which a thinker attempts to see the world In other words, film can establish its own stances about essence, truth, or beauty. Theoretically, this can be done with any art form: it is also possible to see painting, literature, or dance as philosophical activities. However, film has been found much more apt for such models because its integrative mode of time, space, images, and movement brings it much closer to thinking (as will be developed below).

The idea of “philosophy of film” is a little like Kant’s “Critique of Pure Reason” because it implies two ideas at the same time. Kant’s title can be understood as (1) “pure reason being criticized” and as (2) “pure reason doing the criticizing.” In the first case, pure reason is a passive object of research undergoing the scrutiny of critical thought while in the second case pure reason is actively imposing its standards on this critical thought. The same is true for the phrase “philosophy of film,” which can mean (1) that film is undergoing a philosophical examination and (2) that film itself helps to develop a certain type of philosophical thinking that will subsequently be imposed upon various subjects of research. Strictly speaking, any outline of the philosophy of film should be divided into two parts: (1) a philosophy about film and (2) film as an philosophy. The latter occupies a prominent place in many recent continental and Anglo-American discourses, and has been defended by Wartenberg (2006), Mulhall (2002), Frampton (2006), and Smuts (2009), and has been criticized by Russell (2000), Murray Smith (2006), Livingston (2009), and Davies (2009). However, in the practice of much of philosophy of film, both approaches often intermingle. Film as a philosophic experience or philosophy as a filmic experience often appear as two sides of the same coin.

Films are similar to dreams and much of what the philosophical tradition has said about the “reality of the outer world” and its skeptical evaluation can be demonstrated through reflections on film. Here film theory maintains a strong contact with philosophy. The distinction between appearance (that is, dream and poiesis) and reality has been on the agenda of film theory for almost eighty years. The “reality and dream” problem is not limited to the subjectivist approach that perceives film as a manifestation of fantasies and hallucinations. However “realists” like André Bazin have classified film as real, because film is able to capture an authentic reality independent of human subjectivity (see below). Comparisons of films and dreams can reveal new concepts of space and time because dreams seem to take place in an intermediary domain of abstractness and concreteness. Film is not, according to Amédée Ayfre, a thesis about the world; rather it presents the world. Any abstractly existential stance contained in this presentation makes film a philosophical phenomenon. Psychoanalysis represents another approach towards dreams and has a status within the philosophy of film which will be explained below.

a. Continental vs. Analytical

Analytical philosophy of film has been unwilling to identify psychoanalytical elements and some sociological elements, in particular approaches of critical theory or ideology critique, as “philosophical” because it deems that this theory does not satisfy more scientific standards. While a continental film scholar like Christian Metz would find the results of the French school of filmology relevant for the most scientific forms of experimental psychology, analytical philosophy usually rejects continental models based on language. These models are usually derived from the Saussurean model of signification and are present in poetics, semiotics or Lacanian psychology. Instead analytical philosophy favors either cognition-based models or more “classical” questions related to problems such as the ontology of film, analyses of movement, realism, the nature of filmic representation, and explanations of our emotional engagement with fiction. Further, there is in analytical philosophy a strong desire to limit work on the philosophy of film from critical theory and cultural studies practiced in English departments. This problem never occurred in the more eclectic and naturally open field of continental philosophy of film.

Still, in many cases, the distinction between continental and analytical is not easy and does not always pass smoothly along the lines of a European and an American tradition. Although David Bordwell is a cognitive philosopher, initially he was inspired by Russian formalist terminology and was himself a subject of interest for European semioticians. Though he is one of the most scathing critics of the continental paradigm in film theory (together with Carroll he coined the term “SLAB theory” to refer to theories that use the ideas of Saussure, Lacan, Althusser, and Barthes) (Bordwell & Carroll 1996), his early work is “structuralist” or “Foucaultian” in spirit as it analyzes the rules governing the practice of institutional film criticism/theory.

b. French Philosophy of Film

French philosophy has played an outstanding role in the development of a philosophy of film. Henri Bergson was the first philosopher who adopted film as a conceptual model for philosophical thought. Cinema helped him to imagine the distinction between spatialized time and duration, an idea that would remain essential for his entire philosophy. Though Bergson’s ideas bear no relation with the more contemporary language-based models of reason (and his interpreter Gilles Deleuze never used them in that way), Bergson’s thought fused with the remaining field of French philosophy of cinema in an often paradoxical fashion. Though French philosophy of film is composed of diverse elements, French or even continental philosophy of film can appear as amazingly coherent. Deleuze’s Bergsonian concept of the “time-image,” for example, is very much compatible with ideas elaborated by the Russian director Andrei Tarkovsky who derived his insights not from Bergson, but from a critical evaluation of Russian formalist film theory.

In 1946, Gilbert Cohen Séat published the first monograph on the philosophy of film (Essai sur les principes d’une philosophie du film). Jean Epstein’s L’Intelligence d’une machine, a truly philosophical book on film, appeared in the same year. In 1948, the interdisciplinary Parisian École de Filmologie began approaching film from a sociological, psychological, and philosophical angle. Filmology can be considered as a precursor of the semiology of cinema.

In the 1960’s and 1970’s, many principal theoretical discussions (such as auteur theory and genre theory) were developed in the Parisian journal Les Cahiers du cinéma, co-founded in 1951 by André Bazin. It was in this journal that French philosophy of film began to produce its characteristic mixtures of structuralism, semiotics, psychoanalysis, and Marxism. Paradoxically, the affiliation of filmology with semiotics and psychology – provocative as it might have seemed – provided the philosophy of film access to academia in the 1960’s. For European state-financed universities, film studies could never have been the economic boon as they have been in the United States. French philosophy departments remain resistant in the 21^st century and permit the teaching of the philosophy of film only in institutions that are considered off the mainstream or within the newly founded – relatively small – discipline of aesthetics. While the “sociological temptation” exists, overall, French philosophy of film has remained very distinct from the sociology of cinema.

c. Philosophy of Film in Other European Countries

French philosophy of film is a unique phenomenon; no other European country has produced a similarly philosophical output on film. In Italy, Umberto Eco and Pier Paolo Pasolini published writings on film in the 1960s that would quickly be integrated into the French discourse. In Germany, the journal Filmkritik (launched in 1957), was the German equivalent of the Cahiers du cinema, though earlier writings by Frankfurt School members Siegfried Kracauer and Walter Benjamin turned out to be most compatible with French philosophy of film. Different from French and American postwar developments, in Germany, film studies never became institutionalized nor have they developed a consistent link with the praxis of film. German Filmwissenschaft (filmology) – most prominently represented by Thomas Elsaesser – developed along the lines of comparative literature, theater science, and art history rather than plunge into an adventurous speculative discourse. It would be absorbed into academia through the disciplines of Media- and Communication Science. The activities of Filmwissenschaft are diverse though its dominant tendency may be characterized as sociological whereas systematical film analysis is highly empirical. Aestheticians working in German philosophy departments (where the main tendency is analytical) continue the philosophical considerations of film, though hermeneutic film analysis has had some impact.

2. An Overview Of Theories

a. Henri Bergson

In the early 1900’s, Henri Bergson (1859-1941) developed the concepts of “movement-image” and “time-image” (in Matière et memoire), both of which anticipated the development of film theory. Bergson declares the image to be superior to the concept because the image is able to evoke thought content in a more fluent and less abstract fashion. In lectures held at the College de France between 1902-03, Bergson briefly refers to the possibility of “comparing the mechanism of conceptual thought with that of the cinematograph” (now in L’Evolution créatrice, 1991, p. 725, note 1). Bergson’s main philosophical theme is that temporality should be thought of as independent from concepts of spatiality. Bergson contrasts duration, as it is experienced by the human consciousness, with scientific definitions of time, the latter of which, in his view, tends to “spatialize” time. Ironically, Bergson would later reject any possibility of using film as an exemplification of his ideas, in an essay entitled “The Cinematographic Illusion” (also in L’Evolution créatrice). Subsequent developments of Bergson’s ideas on duration by Epstein, Sartre, or Deleuze go, strictly speaking, against the grain of his original thought on cinema.

b. Hugo Münsterberg

The German-American philosopher and psychologist Hugo Münsterberg (1863-1916) wrote the first book on the philosophy of film entitled Photoplay: A Psychological Study (1916, German: Das Lichtspiel: eine psychologische Studie, 1916). Active during the silent film era, Münsterberg attempted to establish cinema as an art form that is different from theater or photography. Coming to America at the age of thirty-four, Münsterberg had clearly been under Neo-Kantian influence in Germany. Photoplay is divided into two parts, the first of which is inspired by experimental psychology dealing with the mental functions of the spectator. This first part is a precursor to the cognitive theory of film. The second part bears clear traits of Neo-Kantian aesthetics as it analyzes, in a formalist fashion, film’s form and function. The Neo-Kantian input became obvious through Münsterberg’s conviction that film is the mirror of the mind and not that of the world; the goal of cinema is not to reproduce reality, but to materialize emotions. Münsterberg theorized about how close-ups and flashbacks parallel acts of consciousness (that is affect, memory) and formulated the ‘film/mind’ analogy that was much explored and criticized by other philosophers (for example Carroll, 1988b).

c. Formalist Approaches

i. The Russian Formalism Tradition

Russian Formalism designates a school of innovative linguists and literary critics. It developed out of modernist movements such as Russian symbolism and constructivism. From 1915 to 1930, both the Moscow group (led by Roman Jakobson) and the St. Petersburg Society for the Study of Poetical Language (OPOJAZ), which included notorious members like Viktor Shklovsky, Osip Brik, Boris Eikhenbaum, and Vladimir Propp, applied newly invented formalist linguistic methods to the study of literature and poetry. Rediscovered in the West in the 1960’s, the work of the Russian Formalists has had an important influence on structuralist theories of literature, and on some of the more recent varieties of Marxist literary criticism.

Several Russian Formalists wrote on film mainly by establishing analogies between film and language. The idea to interpret film as language goes back, among other things, to Shklovsky’s reaction to the writings of the Ukrainian linguist Alexander Potebnja (1836-1891) who thought of poetry as “thinking in images.” According to Shklovsky, this leads to the false assumption that the creation of symbols is the main cognitive occupation. Shklovsky suggested seeing the activity of thinking as a more abstract and relational way of thinking. This model of thinking comes close to a formalist idea of film. Finally, all artistic activity should be seen as a creative reorganization of pre-aesthetic materials: art need not express new content but should make a strange habitualized form.

For formalism, cinematic time (or cinematic reality altogether) is incompatible with naturalist representations. It is not staged, nor does the director transfer reality on the screen by means of intuition (as does, for example, impressionist painting). For the formalists, time is created through montage. Technical terms such as ‘defamiliarization’ (ostranenie) or the ‘story’ (fabula) as opposed to the ‘plot’ (sjuzhet), have become important in Western European and American film studies. Both Christian Metz (1975) and David Bordwell (1985) borrowed heavily from formalism.

1. Sergei Eisenstein

The director Sergei Mikhailovich Eisenstein remains a central figure in formalist film theory and by helping to develop the above idea of time created through montage. One of Eisenstein’s aims was to overcome, in a formalist fashion, “intuitive creativity” through “rational constructive composition of effective elements” (1988a, I, p. 175). Eisenstein designated artistic activity as the process of organizing raw material. A large part of this cinematic theory is based on a principle similar to what Russian Formalists called ostranenie (alienation, estrangement, German: Verfremdung). According to Eisenstein, within every shot there is a conflict between an object and its spatial nature or between an event and its temporal nature. As a consequence of this conflict, cinematic time does not exist as “real time,” but must be experienced as an artistic-technical device. For Eisenstein, montage will never produce a “rhythm” or regularly patterned series of shots because such series would still rely too much on “artistic feeling” or empathy.

Eisenstein was the first person who attempted to see cinema as a thinking process. Recognizing that film reconstructs the actions of the human mind, Eisenstein perceived montage form as “a reconstruction of the laws of the thought process” (1988c, p. 236). His theory of dialectical montage (directly referring to Hegel and Marx) suggests that a third idea can emerge from the presentation of two conflicting shots. Related to this is his concept of “shock to thought” which occurs when the conflict between two shots forces us to think its synthesis (1988b, p. 45). Deleuze takes this idea up in Image-Temps and explains that this shock forces thinking to think itself as well as to think the whole (p. 207). Another famous concept is Eisenstein’s idea of cinema as a revolutionary ‘kino-fist’ formulated in reaction against his rival Dziga Vertov’s Kino Eye group (see below). It is difficult to summarize the entire body of Eisenstein’s writings as they teem with unpredictable insights and can certainly not be reduced to formalist recipes towards technicality.

2. Vsevolod Pudovkin

Vsevolod Illarionovitch Pudovkin (1893-1953) elaborated in the late 1920s and early 1930s on a theory of film based on narrative and spatiotemporal continuity. In Kinorezhisser i kinomaterial (1926), Kinoszenarii: Teoria szenarija (1926), and Akter v fil’me (1934) (published in English as Film Technique and Film Acting), Pudovkin examines such devices as contrast, parallelism, and symbolism. Several of Pudovkin’s formulations influenced Rudolf Arnheim (see below).

3. Lev Kuleshov

The idea that editing constitutes the “essence” of film art originated with the Russian director and theoretician Lev Kuleshov (1899-1970) who experimented with montage in the 1920s in an almost scientific fashion and is also one of the key exponents of the ‘film as language’ idea. Thoughts on montage are expressed as early as 1920 in his study “The Banner of Cinematography” (Engl. in Selected Works, 1987, Moscow). Kuleshov was able to show with the help of experiments that an isolated shot has no meaning (the famous Kuleshov effect).

4. Yuri Lotman

The Russo-Estonian semiotician Yuri Mikhailovitch Lotman (1922-1993) set out to reformulate the Saussurean notion of the sign by establishing a relationship of necessity between the signified and the signifier (which Saussure believed to be arbitrary). Lotman was the main proponent of the Tartu-Moscow School and his work is directly linked to the Russian Formalist tradition. He is perhaps most noted for the coinage of the term “semiosphere.” In his Semiotika kino i problemy kinoestetiki (1973) (Semiotics of Cinema), Lotman distinguished between the different levels of illusion and reality in film by analyzing the cinematic shot, narration, as well as the ideological function of cinema as mass-media. His distinction between pictorial/iconic signs used in the visual arts and conventional signs (words, letters) as used in literature had a central position in his work. Lotman also insisted that the cinematic language of a film is always related to exterior cultural codes.

ii. Béla Balász: Film as Language

Béla Balász (1949-1984) was a Hungarian film aesthetician who wrote in Hungarian and German. His books, Der sichtbare Mensch (The Visible Man, 1924) and Der Geist des Films (The Spirit of Film, 1930) were the first theoretical books on film after Münsterberg’s Photoplay. They remain the founding stones of modern film theory though they have been translated into English only in 2010. Balász’s book Theory of the Film (Hungarian, 1948, English 1953) picked up threads from the earlier books and brought him posthumous international fame. In general, Balász strove to offer to modern man possibilities of overcoming his particular state of estrangement by designing a utopian visual culture in which film plays an essential role. Balász’s ambition to describe film as a language brought him close to the Russian Formalists; he was actually able to advance views on montage that would be too mechanistic even for Eisenstein’s standards. However, a genuinely philosophical component enters his work through complex reflections on cinematic “reality.” In Theory of the Film, Balász wrote: “Although objective reality is independent of the subject and his subjective consciousness, beauty is not merely objective reality, not an attribute of the object entirely independent of the spectator, not something that would be there objectively even without a corresponding subject even if there were no human beings on earth” (p. 33). Malcolm Turvey classifies Balász (together with Jean Epstein, Dziga Vertov, and Siegfried Kracauer) as a “revelationist” because for all these theorists, the cinema is a means of enlightenment: it escapes the limits of human sight and reveals the true nature of reality. To some extent, the particular way of tackling the reality problem in film was determined by Balász’s interest in dreams. Two of Balász’s prose works are entitled Youth of a Dreamer and Fairytale, Ritual, and Film, the latter of which testified to his interest in film as “otherworldliness.” Without giving in to mystification and decidedly refusing fades or dissolves, Balász remained fascinated by film’s “ability to transform all things in space into bearers of expressions” and interpreted some original scenes psychoanalytically, such as substantial dream images (cf. Loewi, p. 318).

iii. Mikhail Bakhtin: Dialogicity and Reception

The ‘Bakhtin School’ theorists Mikhail M. Bakhtin, Pavel N. Medvedev, and Valentin N. Voloshinov developed elements of formalism by emphasizing the dialogical and polyphonic character of texts and cultural phenomena. Though the Bakhtin School did not write explicitly on film, it should be mentioned here for two reasons. First, Mikhail Bakhtin’s (1895-1975) writings had indirect influence on the film semiotics of Julia Kristeva and Tzvetan Todorov. Bakhtinian concepts of dialogism and polyphony are crucial because they can help to address fundamental questions about film form and reception. Second, film is an extremely good example for polyphony. While in the novel we most typically encounter the monologic narrator, in the film, the narrative, the character’s appearance, the dialogues, and several other elements appear simultaneously within one time frame (cf. Vice, p. 142). Also, Bakhtin’s central notion of the chronotope exemplifies the fusion of time and space that is typical for film.

iv. Rationalism: Galvano Della Volpe

The Italian Marxist philosopher Galvano Della Volpe (1895-1968), who in 1954 published a book called Il verosimile filmico e altri scritti di estetica, designed a rational aesthetics of film emphasizing unity, coherence, and harmony. Della Volpe formulated an organic theory of literature affirming the rational instead of the sentimental value of the work of art. Art is not distinct from science because both are based on the unity of the concept (in Critica del gusto). Central is Della Volpe’s critique of Crocean idealism, but also of materialism. Della Volpe established an epistemology of art that voluntarily remains indifferent towards social contexts or contents and excels in the analysis of technical, structural or formal processes in art. Della Volpe drew greatly from Aristotle’s Poetics. Emphasizing the analysis of formal aspects, Della Volpe pointed out film’s capacity to present the world symbolically as well as its ability to express abstract concepts. The latter happened for him mainly through montage. Similar to Jean Mitry, Della Volpe criticized the reduction of film to language; furthermore he was inspired by Pudovkin’s distinction between ‘plasticity’ and ‘concreteness’ of filmic images. Finally, Della Volpe established cinematic verisimilitude as non-equivalent to reality.

v. Semiotics/Semiology

Semiotics is the study of signs and symbols and examines how meaning is created and communicated through signifying processes. In France, the term sémiologie is more often used than the term sémiotique, though there does not seem to be a clear distinction between the terms. The discipline of semiology goes back to Ferdinand de Saussure whereas semiotics was founded by Charles Sanders Peirce, who was later taken up by Deleuze (rather than Saussure).

1. Gilbert Cohen-Séat

In 1946, Gilbert Cohen-Séat published the first monograph on film which bears the word “philosophy” in its title (Essai sur les principes d’une philosophie du film). The Revue internationale de filmologie was founded soon afterwards and Cohen-Séat’s name remains linked to filmology. Arguably, his most important contribution to film studies was the distinction between “filmic facts” and “cinematic facts”: “The filmic fact consists of the expression of life (the life of the world, the spirit, the imagination, of beings and things) through a system of combined images (visual-natural or conventional- and auditory-sounds and words). The cinematic fact, instead, consists of social circulation of sensations, ideas, feelings, and materials that come from life itself and that cinema shapes according to its desires,” (Essai…, p. 57). Cohen-Séat’s scientific approach made him a precursor of the semiotics of cinema.

2. Roland Barthes

Roland Barthes’ influence on film theory is similar to that of the Bakhtin school. Though having written almost nothing on film, his narratology that strives to see theatre, photography, and music as texts has deeply influenced our ways of seeing film as the interplay of voices or codes. Paradoxically, this thinker who mused so much about “floating signifiers,” found very disturbing the fact that in films, signifiers are in motion: “The filmic, very paradoxically, cannot be grasped in the film ‘in situation’, ‘in movement’, in its natural state’, but only in that major artifact, the still” (1977, p. 65).

3. Christian Metz

Christian Metz (1931–1994) was the initiator of a film analysis that relies in the most outspoken way on semiotics and is, like Barthes, what the French call a “sémiologue.” In general, Metz’s approach towards cinema has become the prototypical example of a quasi-scientific form of film theory. Apart from linguistic structuralism, Metz borrowed from psychoanalysis, in particular from Jacques Lacan and his writings on the mechanisms of dreams and voyeurism. This allowed him to explain perceptual phenomena of the filmic narrative from the point of view of the perceiving subject and take into consideration the unconscious processes of desire that allegedly position the spectator ideologically. Metz is particularly renowned for his “grand synagmatics” (grande syntagmatique) through which he categorized the most frequent codes and signifying units (called ‘syntagmes’) in cinema. Metz established the single shot as the smallest unit and the entire film as the largest one. He classified all syntagmes in distinct categories, distinguishing, for example, between chronological and a-chronological syntagmes.

According to Metz, cinematic language (langage) is not constituted by all elements that appear in a film, but only by those things that can only appear in film. Film analysis should highlight only those signifying figures that are truly cinematographic. Metz questioned Eisenstein’s vision of cinema as a langue because a langue is a highly organized code, whereas language covers a much broader area. Film should not be seen as langue because cinematic signs are reinvented or are updated in every film (Essais sur la signification, p. 47). Some might find Metz’s approach anti-philosophical because it so vehemently denies the possibility of phenomenological considerations. On the other hand, Metz’s work can be considered as philosophical because it deals with ethical implications (employing Marxist themes) and it extensively discusses the matter of reality and of dreams through a Freudian perspective.

4. Pier Paolo Pasolini

Pier Paolo Pasolini (1922-1975) was, and remains, a relatively little known as a theorist in the United States, but he held a central position in European film theory. Under the influence of Barthes, Metz, and Gramsci, Pasolini’s essays on cinema collected in the book Empirismo Eretico (1972) are exercises in semiotics that raised, in the 1960’s, a debate involving Umberto Eco (1967) and Metz (1968). When Pasolini postulated that cinema is the “written language of reality,” he was not intending to establish cinematic reality as a sort of cinematic language, nor is he preaching realism. Pasolini wants to conceive the real as cinematic. Reality is the discourse of things that cinema re-narrates. This project is highly philosophical and, famously, in 1967 Pasolini remarked, in the Journal of the Communist Party, that “semiotics has not taken the step which would lead it to become a Philosophy.”

d. Cinematographic Ontology and Phenomenology

i. Phenomenology

Phenomenology is a philosophy that goes back to Edmund Husserl and takes as a point of departure a sort of “experience” that is strictly designed as the sensible intuition of phenomena. On the basis of this prescription, phenomenology attempts to understand the essence of what is experienced. Martin Heidegger, though influenced by Husserl, interpreted phenomenology as an ontology, that is, as a discipline attempting to understand the Being of ourselves as Dasein (existence) and preparing for an understanding of the meaning of Being as such. His version is called “existential phenomenology.” Both Husserl’s and Heidegger’s phenomenology remain critical towards metaphysics. In the philosophy of film, the phenomenological, “synthetic” approach has often been opposed to the “analytical,” semiotic one.

1. Maurice Merleau-Ponty

Like Bergson, Merleau-Ponty (1908-1961) criticized all attempts of representing the world in a purely scientific fashion as reductive. In film, the meaning of an image depends on the preceding image and their succession creates a new reality. Merleau-Ponty has had a considerable influence on Cohen-Séat (see Andrew 1978: p. 46). In 1945, Merleau-Ponty devoted a lecture to the possibilities of phenomenological interpretations of cinema (“Le cinéma et la nouvelle psychologie” in Sens et non-sens) where he depicted film not as a sum of images, but as a temporal phenomenon. The central term in Merleau-Ponty’s musings on film is the idea of immersion. For the phenomenologist, humans are thrown into a life world to which they remain attached in the most natural and inconspicuous way. Film provides a phenomenological experience par excellence because in the cinema the human consciousness is consistently immersed in a world. Merleau-Ponty’s ideas never developed into a phenomenological theory of film, but have inspired theorists of Neo-Realism, such as Ayfre and Bazin and have been developed by Vivian Sobchack (1992).

2. Amédée Ayfre

Amédée Ayfre (1895-1963), a student of Merleau-Ponty, rejected formalist components such as style as essential characteristics of cinema and attempted to establish a “phenomenological realism” (Ayfre, 1964: 214) in film studies. In his Conversion aux images (written together with Henri Agel) Ayfre explicitly referred to the phenomenological ambition of strictly adhering to mere descriptions of experience without being influenced by either scientific or psychological considerations of causes (pp. 212-13). Ayfre’s notion of écriture as it appears in the cinéma d’auteur, designated “neither a content nor a style” (1969, p. 162), but attempted to go beyond the division of film into form and content. Phenomenological existence transgresses constructive devices as well as stylization and Ayfre’s sympathies clearly went towards Neo-Realist cinema (see below). As a Jesuit priest, Ayfre strove to reconcile his existentially-minded phenomenology with his Catholicism. Ayfre’s phenomenological realism is meant to depict a “spiritual” reality and not just a “real” one;it creates an illusion due to a “prodigious asceticism of means.” Ayfre’s concept of realism is diametrically opposed to formalist ideas about “realistic” narrative modes. David Bordwell, for example, believed that realistic expressions can be grasped best through norms and codes which vary according to different criteria, but remain formalizable in the last instance. “Realistic” motivations will be applied according to what the given narrative mode defines as realistic. For Bordwell, “verisimilitude in a classical narrative film is quite different from verisimilitude in the art cinema”(Narration in the Fiction Film, 1985, pp. 153-54).Ayfre, on the other hand, saw cinematic reality as the internal logic of a universe created by the director. Ayfre’s realism was also opposed to psychological interpretations because the reality we encounter in a film is more than merely the subconscious emanation or the reverie of a director. Ayfre’s younger collaborator Henri Agel (1911-2008) pursued a long publishing career and never abandoned the initial tendency, defining himself until the end as a “humanist and a spiritualist”.

ii. Realism:

Realism attempts to recreate life in art by relying on realistic presentation while minimizing controlling devices in the process of artistic production. In literature, realism has been developed by Balzac, Flaubert, and Zola. In film, Italian Neo-Realism is the most important realist movement.

1. André Bazin

The establishment of neo-realist film theory was mainly been the task of André Bazin (1918-1958) and Ayfre. Bazin’s realism was similar to Ayfre’s phenomenological realism, more so since he accepted Merleau-Ponty’s idea of reality as “the pure appearance of everything that is in the world” (“la pure apparence des êtres au monde” (Questions IV, p. 62). In 1957, Bazin openly adopted Ayfre’s expression “phenomenological realism” in order to label the kind of films in which “reality is not modified according to psychological functions or dramatic requirements” (Questions IV, p. 138). Dudley Andrew writes that “Bazin saw in realism a kind of style which reduced signification to a minimum. In other words, he saw the rejection of style as a potential stylistic option” (Andrew, 1976, p. 143).

Together with Alexandre Astruc, Bazin was also responsible for the so-called “auteur theory,” which grew mainly out of the two writers’ works and since has been central for French New Wave cinema. François Truffaut and other Cahiers authors joined later on, as well as Andrew Sarris in the USA. Bazin’s realism had a metaphysically significant backdrop. Like Ayfre’s phenomenological realism, Bazin’s phenomenological ontology was strongly marked by religious convictions. Sometimes terms like “real presence” or “revelation of reality” appear to have almost religious connotations. In this sense, Bazin’s philosophy was essentialist, in spite of the existentialist stances to which he was submitted. Bazin remains one of the most anti-formalist theoreticians. In his opinion, neo-realist films “aim to reduce montage to zero and to transport to the screen reality in its continuity” (p. 146).

2. Siegfried Kracauer

Siegfried Kracauer’s (1889-1966) writings on film were based on sociology and psychology. His conviction that film has a realist character made him a main proponent of cinematic realism and brought him close to Bazin (whom he never mentions). Kracauer based his realism on the resemblance that he perceived between film and photography. For post-surrealists critics such as Bazin and Kracauer, cinema should look for its genuine expression within a kind of realist expression that can be described as the exact opposite of the surrealist cinema of dreams and symbolisms. Interestingly, in the end, Kracauer defined an alternative form of dreamlike realism able to transmit reality “as if it were a dream”. In his Theory of Film he wrote: “Perhaps films look most like dreams when they overwhelm us with the crude and unnegotiated presence of natural objects—as if the camera had just now extricated them from the womb of physical existence and as if the umbilical cord between image and actuality had not yet been severed. There is something in the abrupt immediacy and shocking veracity of such pictures that justifies their identification as dream images” (p. 224).

Like Ayfre, Kracauer was opposed to any stylization of reality: the realistic character of dream elements is compared to those objects that we can find in nature. Kracauer’s realism was not based on calculations with possibilities of literal reproductions, but on the director’s ability to capture a certain spiritual quantity that is supposed to be enclosed to reality. Ayfre’s phenomenological realism, which strove to depict a “spiritual” reality, and not just a “real” one is echoed by Kracauer’s distinction between “photographic reality” and “camera reality” (Theory of Film, p. 150). For Kracauer, it was important that the “the form giving tendency does not rise above the realistic one” (p. 67). Ayfre, Bazin, and Kracauer engaged in paradoxical projects: Ayfre attempted to apply an aesthetic asceticism on reality without applying stylization; Bazin attempted to retrieve style by rejecting style; Kracauer attempted to establish a paradoxical balance between realistic and formalizing tendencies.

3. Dziga Vertov

Dziga Vertov’s theory of the “cinema of fact” can be considered a form of cinematic realism. In 1919, Vertov founded the group Kino-oki (“cinema-eyes”) insisting, in various manifestos, that the cinema of the future will not be that of stars and of fiction, but a cinema of facts. Vertov developed a concept of cinema as “life caught in awareness,” in which the camera eye innocently captures reality “as it is” without stylizing it. This clearly joins the ambitions of the neo-realists. The Russian director Andrei Tarkovsky, who was strongly influenced by Vertov and by Russian “Documentary Aesthetics” in the 1960’s, has indeed been likened to Bazin and neo-realism. Jon Beasley-Murray points out that Tarkovsky restored the “actuality of time” by constructing a subjectivity by which this reality is inhabited (1997, p. 47).

iii. Existentialism

1. Alexandre Astruc’s Caméra-Stylo

A disciple of Bazin, Alexandre Astruc (1923-) established in his essay “La Caméra-stylo” (1948) an aesthetics of cinema that based its expressions on the idea of writing rather than on conventional conceptions of the image. The language of film can be shaped until it becomes as subtle as the language of literature. Cinema is not a consecution of images. Instead, it adopts more abstract characteristics because it is able to integrate abstraction in itself. Abstraction is no longer present as an underlying structure of the film (as is the case with montage), but it expresses itself directly: “By language I mean a form in which and by which an artist can express his thoughts, however abstract they may be, or translate his obsessions exactly as he does in the contemporary essay or novel. That is what I would like to call this new age of cinema, the age of caméra-stylo” (Astruc, 1968, p. 18).

Like Bazin’s and Kracauer’s,Astruc’s strategy is directed against surrealist cinema. But it is also directed against conventional documentaries because the caméra-stylo intends to grasp “any kind of reality.” In a film “recorded” by a caméra-stylo there is no evocation of subjective, intimate symbols; nothing has been produced by the artist through the direct transposition of an inner reality; nor is there is any objective recording of reality. Film is not a documentation undertaken from a detached point of view located outside the things filmed. This is why the camera works like a pen: it records concrete reality, but then transforms it instantly into an abstraction. A caméra-stylo can produce an “écriture,” but it would be too simple to say that a film is transformed into literature only because the camera is transformed, in a metaphorical way, into a pen. The use of the camera as a pen has more to do with the interplay of realization and abstraction or, to use another term, of stylization. In other words, the writing camera produces style. This makes Astruc’s theory different from “anti-stylization” movements such as realism and (to some extent) phenomenology. However, it is important to understand that the caméra-stylo philosophy does not preach formalist stylization, but attempts to capture style, which makes it, paradoxically, compatible with some realist and phenomenological stances. Marcel Martin goes as far as saying that the “new language” which cinema has discovered makes sense as long as style turns out to be the main protagonist of this medium. “The real main character of this cinema is thus the style (…). The ‘poetic cinema’ (cinéma de poésie) is thus essentially founded on the exercise of style as inspiration” (Martin, 1967, p. 68).

iv. Film as Thought

Jacques Aumont, in A quoi pensent les films?, insists that “film has the power of thinking”. In the introduction of this article, the idea to see film as a form of thinking has been addressed as an important part of the philosophy of film that begins with Eisenstein.

1. Jean Epstein: Film as Artificial Intelligence

The avant-garde director Jean Epstein (1897-1953) remains better known for his theoretical writings than for his films, many of which are no longer extant. Together with Eisenstein, Epstein is a precursor of “cinema as thought” theories. Mixing Eisenstein’s thoughts with Marxism and the intellectual potential flowing out of the French Impressionist School of Film active during the 1920’s, Epstein designs a philosophy that is more reminiscent of Bergson than of formalism and can even be called anti-semiotic. Film is much more than a text or a writing; it is a machine able to produce a dreamlike reality by unhinging the most basic rules of logic and time, and by overcoming human reason.

In his major work L’Intelligence d’une machine (1921), Epstein discovered that cinema as a thinking machine is able to liberate us from the constraints of logic in order to produce a poetic and dreamlike reality. Cinema manipulates space and time. Comparing film with the microscope, it seems that Epstein anticipated contemporary computer reality or virtual reality. Cinema is a “robot brain” (p. 71) able to transcend the physical and mental limits of humans. The cinematograph, like the calculator, is the first materialization of “machines for thinking” (p. 48) and more complex ones will follow. Obviously inspired by Bergson, Epstein observes how cinema stretches and condenses duration and lets us feel the variable and relative nature of time. Cinema thinks time is a “partial mechanical brain” that develops a “rich philosophy full of surprises” (p. 71). The reality that cinema thinks is “the sum of many irrealities”. For some, Epstein’s theory might smack a little too much of pseudo-science but he plausibly defines cinema as a “machine for producing dreams” (p. 55).

2. Jean Mitry

Some might remember Jean Mitry (1907-1988) as an “anti-semiologist” film thinker because of his harsh criticism of Christian Metz in La Sémiologie en question (1987). Still this theorist and film maker has his own semiotic past. In 1963, the publication of the two volumes of Esthétique et psychologie du cinéma was seen as a major event in the world of French cinema theory. The highly synthetic book deals with all thinkable subjects and accepts some of Bazin’s realism as well as several formalist patterns, but does not – though the title might suggest this – engage in Freudian psychoanalytical elaborations. Mitry’s method was that of perceptual psychology and his refusal of Bazin’s ambition to discover in cinema a “world beyond the world” is absolute. A philosophical input comes from another side. Mitry was asking himself if “filmic language does not reflect thought in the way in which it produces itself [‘en train de se faire’] much better than could do words (…) which only crystallize thoughts in the form of more or less independent ideas by translating a thought that is already achieved” (p. 90). It becomes clear here that Mitry working within the thread of those “Cinema as Thought” theorists presented in the present sub-chapter. Mitry found cinema to be unique in that it signifies only while functioning (p. 63). It is thus consistent that he reproaches, in La Sémiologie en Question, Christian Metz (his admirer) his reductive application of linguistics to film because the language of film is not based on words. Mitry’s position can be summarized as that of a phenomenology of perception and his work often proceeds synoptically with the precision of a historian.

3. Gilles Deleuze

Deleuze’s (1925-1995) analysis of cinema was founded on Bergson’s work Matière et memoire and C. S. Peirce’s taxonomy of signs. Deleuze’s engagement with both represents a rupture with the Saussureian linguistic semiotic tradition. Deleuze rejected “linguistic” as well as psychoanalytic models of film theorisation. Like Mitry, Deleuze believed that film, as it represents and reflects on time, is incompatible with language; for him, the pre-signifying ‘signaletic material’ that films are made of was not assimilable to models of semiotics. In this regard, Deleuze anticipated a number of analytic-cognitivist film theorists.

Similar to Epstein, Deleuze believed that film can alter our modes of thinking about movement and time. In a Bergsonian way, Deleuze put forward that cinematic experience was as a means to perceive time and movement as a whole. The starting point of Bergson’s philosophy was the distinction between temporal and spatial reality. Bergson modified the traditional relationship between unity and repetition by attributing singularity to time and discontinuity to space. Lived time and measured time should not be confused. Bergson’s thesis is that the human who looks at the clock perceives merely juxtapositions of different positions of the hand, which bear no link among themselves. Only the ‘I’ (consciousness) experiences a time whose essence is duration. Correspondingly, Deleuze held that in cinema, our mind does not need to put together the successive percepts or sensations it perceives; rather it receives them as a whole.

Deleuze seemed to be going back in time as he attempted to base his theory of cinema on a point before the semiotic tradition and even before Shklovsky’s formalism which strove to overcome Potebnja’s model of “thinking in images.” More precisely, Deleuze held that films do not think with simple images, but with movement-images and time-images. In his two monumental books on cinema, “Image-Mouvement” (Cinéma I) and “Image-Temps” (Cinéma II), Deleuze engaged the entire history of cinema in order to show a difference between these two types of images. Frequently, we encounter the movement-image, which is based on a sensory-motor scheme (it shows an action, which produces a reaction). In the movement-image, the action imposes itself upon time, it is the action which determines the duration of a scene and the next scene is a reaction to this action (see Deleuze 1984). The time-image, on the other hand, is based on pure thinking. The time-image emerged in cinema after WWII mainly with Italian Neo-Realism and French New Wave cinema. It does not follow the scheme of action-reaction, but it can evoke a time that is prior to movement. Time-images do not simply show us actions and movements, but different layers of time, all of which converge within single points of present. These images can express a present that constantly reaches for the past and for the future.

Deleuze brought film studies closer to philosophy. For Deleuze, film was superior to other arts because it combines time and movement in such a necessary fashion. More than that, cinema must be considered as a philosophy because it constructs its own “concepts.” Cinema is not an applied philosophy submitted to traditional philosophical concepts, but it develops “cinematic” concepts. It does not simply represent reality, but is in itself an ontological practice. Therefore cinema is more than simply an art. In this sense, Deleuze was doing neither film theory nor aesthetics, but he thinks of film as a philosophy. In Deleuze’s earlier writings, art is able to draw on concepts and therefore not confined to percepts or ‘blocs of sensation.’ However, even here Deleuze did not recommend extracting as many concepts as possible from cinema: “A theory of cinema is not about cinema but about the concepts sparked by cinema” (p. 365). Later, in What is Philosophy? (1991), Deleuze (and his co-writer Felix Guattari) reserved “concepts” for philosophy only and declared that cinema thinks with affects and precepts.

Cinema’s highest objective is nothing other than promoting thought and the functioning that comes from thinking. This is what makes cinema different from mere dreams which, in Deleuze’s view, are not thinking. Bad films do nothing more than induce a dream in the spectators (Image-temps, p. 219), they simply reiterate sensory-motor clichés that provoke neither thought or affect.

4. Filmosophy

More recently, Daniel Frampton has added a brick to the wall called “Film as Thought” by insisting that film does not narrate or show things, characters, or actions. Instead, it thinks them. When watching a film we observe a thinking process. In his book Filmosophy (2006) Frampton attempts to grasp this cinematic thinking process with the help of newly coined concepts such as ‘film-thinking’ and ‘filmind’ and assigns to ‘filmosophy’ the task of “conceptualizing all film as an organic intelligence” (p. 7). Film-thinking is not a metaphorical way of arranging reality, but “the filmind has its own particular film-phenomenology, its own way of attending to its world” (p. 91). There is a film-like way of thinking. Philosophers like Bachelard, for example, were able to produce “a flow that weaves discourses together, yet still with rigor and meaning” (p. 179). Although philosophers can learn from film-thinking, Frampton insists that “film has its own kind of thinking” (p. 23), that it “cannot show us human thinking, [but that] it shows us ‘film-thinking’” (p. 47). Thinking is radically removed from the activity of merely processing data.

v. Film as Poetic Art: Susanne Langer

Susanne Langer’s philosophy of film drew very much upon the analogy of film and dream. Langer was an American pragmatist philosopher close to the continental tradition. She was also a frequent reference point in analytic philosophy of film (for example, in Carroll). For Langer, cinema is an art that has introduced the “dream mode” as its main artistic expression, a mode that finally enables cinema to establish itself as an independent medium. Still, film is not a daydream – which is but a wilful imitation of a dream. In her essay “A Note on Film,” Langer wrote: “[Film] is not any poetic art we have known before; it makes the primary illusion—virtual history—in its own mode. This is, essentially, the dream mode. I do not mean that it copies dream, or puts one into a daydream. Not at all, no more than literature invokes memory, or makes us believe that we are remembering’’ (p. 200).

e. Psychology/Psychoanalysis

Psychological film theory began with the publication of Münsterberg’s Photoplay, in which the first part is inspired by experimental psychology. In remainder of the twentieth century, more philosophical approaches would use psychoanalysis for the decoding of unconscious elements that were supposed to contain truth by reading films through schemes of symbolization and representation. These approaches are current in the continental tradition.

i. Rudolf Arnheim

Rudolf Arnheim (1904-2007) published Film als Kunst (Film as Art) in 1932, defending film as a form of art distinct from the productions of the entertainment industry. Historically, Arnheim’s main writings on film can be situated between Münsterberg and Balász. Later Arnheim founded a full-fledged aesthetics on the theory of perception and gestalt theory (especially in Art and Visual Perception, 1954). Comments on film are sparse in Arnheim’s later work, but the following quotation, which links film interpretation to Freudian psychology, is remarkable because it addresses a possible extension of the Freudian vision of dream into Arnheim’s own domain. In Visual Thinking (1969), Arnheim pointed to a fundamental link between film and dream that psychology should follow: “Freud raises the question of how the important logical links of reasoning can be represented in images. An analogous problem, he says, exists for the visual arts. There are indeed parallels between dream images and those created in art on the one hand, and the mental images serving as the vehicle of thought on the other; but by noting the resemblance one also becomes aware of the differences, and these can help to characterize thought imagery more precisely” (p. 241).

1. Psychoanalysis vs. Cognitive Science

Reflections on the relationship between the spectator and the film have become particularly central in French film theory since the publication of Christian Metz’s Le signifiant imaginaire: psychoanalyse et cinéma (1977) and Metz’s Lacanian developments as well as the writings of Jean Louis Baudry. For psychoanalysis, the proximity between film and dream is essential because film interpretation is seen as a sort of Freudian dream interpretation. Almost half a century after Arnheim’s above remark, psychoanalytical film theory is still struggling to explain the ways in which unconscious elements obstruct the reception of films and to understand how films spark unconscious or irrational processes. This approach can be understood as diametrically opposed to that of cognitive science which is also interested in how spectators make sense of and respond to films, but which observes the viewer’s conscious processing of films.

ii. The Mindscreen Theory

Bruce F. Kawin began his book Mindscreen: Bergman and First-Person Film (1978) with the question: “Film is a dream—but whose?”(p. 3). Kawin claimed that dreamlike films are self-conscious artworks in which narrative voices have been “generalized” up to a point that we perceive the artworks themselves as if they appear on a “dream screen.” Kawin adopted the idea of the dream screen from the American Psychologist Bertram D. Lewin (1950) whose ideas had, in their time, contributed in an outstanding way to an increasing interest in dreams in post-Freudian America.In an article entitled “Interferences from the Dream Screen,” Lewin declared: “In a previous communication, a special structure, the dream screen was distinguished from the rest of the dream and defined as the blank background upon which the dream picture appears to be projected. The term was suggested by the action pictures because, like the analogue in the cinema, the dream screen is either not noted by the dreaming spectator, or it is ignored due to the interest in the pictures and actions that appear on it’’ (p. 104).

Kawin’s contribution to film theory consists of examining the validity of the dream screen (or mindscreen) in cinema providing clues to particularities of the narrative structure of film. In Bergman’s Persona, for example, there is “an impression of the mindscreen’s being generalized,” so that the film’s self-consciousness appears to originate from within. Being identified neither with a specific character nor with the filmmaker, the “potential linguistic focus” takes on the characteristics of a mindscreen: “The film becomes first-person, it speaks itself” (Kawin, pp. 113-14). Kawin anticipates Frampton’s ‘filmind’.

iii. Slavoj Žižek

Given his use of psychoanalysis and Marxism, the extremely influential Slovenian philosopher Slavoj Žižek (1949-) is a typical representative of continental film theory, the more so since he has explicitly opposed Anglo-American, empirical approaches (see “Introduction to 2001”). Žižek uses Lacanian concepts and insights (most importantly his notion of the Other) and works with concepts derived from the philosophies of Derrida and Deleuze, such as a decentralized notion of the subject. The value of his philosophy of film, developed in numerous books, seems to reside mainly in his consistent and original application of abstract theories to films though he has also submitted various concepts to original developments. His writings do not represent philosophy of film as such; rather they are attempts to read ideology by analyzing contemporary popular films.

f. Walter Benjamin and the Frankfurt School

Like Siegfried Kracauer, Walter Benjamin (1892-1940) belongs to the Frankfurt School of philosophy. Benjamin believed that the techniques of reproduction can be used for the reproduction of traditional works only, and also as new modes of representation. Benjamin’s theory of film is sometimes associated with that of cinematographic realism. Most famously, in his essay Das Kunstwerk im Zeitalter seiner technischen Reproduzierbarkeit [The Work of Art in the Age of Mechanical Reproduction] (1935), Benjamin interpreted modifications of the original through the process of reproduction, as a loss of the work’s aura.

Benjamin favored an allegorical kind of photography (that is definitely opposed to the art of montage), examples of which he found in early photography because it can be perceived something like an aura: “In the fleeting expression of a human face seen in early photographs, the aura shows itself for the last time. This is what makes their melancholic and thus incomparable beauty” (I, 2, p. 445). Like Epstein, Benjamin believed that cinema can provide us with extraordinary access to reality: the details that are produced by the close-up or the forms that are revealed by slow motion can “give us access to the experience of an optical unconscious just like psychoanalysis offers us the experience of the instinctive unconscious” (p. 460). In this sense, knowledge about the world is a matter of a sudden “awakening” to the world and this world can be a cinematic world.

Theodor W. Adorno (1903–1969), another member of the Frankfurt School, would transform Benjamin’s notion of “mass culture” into that of the “Kulturindustrie,” in which he saw as a systematized commodification encompassing ‘high’ and ‘mass’ art. This stands in contrast to Benjamin’s view of popular or mass culture as concealing a certain emancipatory potential to be unleashed by dialectical criticism. In their book Dialectic of Enlightenment (1972), Adorno and Max Horkheimer (1895–1973), developed a cultural critique that contains some dispersed but pertinent references to the culture industry of film excelling in standardized production techniques and catering for commercial and not for cultural purposes.

g. Hermeneutic Film Analysis

The hermeneutic approach is based on the interpretation of texts and detects the semantic potential of a text as well as its different levels of meanings. Hermeneutics can be seen as a branch of phenomenology and many of Ayfre’s and Agel’s texts bear traces of hermeneutic thinking. Still, in film analysis its method has mainly been developed in proximity with the interpretation of literature. Though hermeneutics of film explains the semiotic status of iconic signs, it never engages in the construction of semiotic systems because it is constantly aware of the historicity of any analysis. Today, hermeneutic film analysis is mainly practiced in German academic departments of Media and Communication Science. Moreover, such analysis has been brought to a point by Anke-Marie Lohmeier.

h. Future Perspectives

The future of continental philosophy of film will probably be developed in several areas. Žižek’s Lacanian approach, as long as it does not entirely enter the stream of cultural studies, will attract philosophers who deem that ideology should be the primary focus of cinema studies. Another area that might develop is the one pioneered by Bruce Kawin and Daniel Frampton, who provide a vocabulary for describing our aesthetic experience of film that transcends both Deleuze’s conceptual analyses of movement and time and phenomenological approaches. It clearly opens up philosophy to new ways of thinking. Equally promising is a whole range of “crossovers,” such as those that combine semiotic and cognitive paradigms of which Warren Buckland’s The Cognitive Semiotics of Film (2000) is an example. Other crossovers synthesize Deleuzian film theory and phenomenology (Shaw 2008), or the Cavellian-Wittgensteinian approach with continental philosophy (of which Stephen Mulhall is an example).

3. References and Further Reading

Agel, Henri. Esthétique du cinéma. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1957.
Aitken, Ian. European Film Theory and Cinema: A Critical Introduction. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2001.
Allen, Richard and Murray Smith. Film Theory and Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1997.
Andrew, Dudley J. Major Film Theories: An Introduction. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1976.
Arnheim, Rudolf. Visual Thinking. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1969.
Astruc, Alexandre. “The Birth of a New Avant-Garde: La Caméra-Stylo,” in Graham, Peter, ed., The New Wave. London: Secker and Warburg, 1968.
Aumont, Jacques. A quoi pensent les films? Paris: Séguier, 1996.
Ayfre, Amédé. Conversion aux images? Paris: Cerf, 1964.
Ayfre, Amédé. Le Cinéma et sa vérité. Paris: Cerf, 1969.
Bakhtin, Mikhail. The Dialogic Imagination. Austin: University of Texas Press, 1981.
Balász, Béla. Theory of the Film. New York: Arno Press, 1972.
Balázs, Béla. Early Film Theory: Visible Man and The Spirit of Film (trans. Rodney Livingstone, ed. by Erica Carter). New York: Berghahn, 2010.
Barthes, Roland. Image-Music-Text. New York: Hill and Wang, 1977.
Bazin, André. Qu’est-ce que le cinéma? Vol. I-IV. Paris: Cerf, 1985 [1958].
Beasley-Murray, Jon. “Whatever Happened to Neorealism? Bazin, Deleuze, and Tarkovsky’s Long Take,” in D.N. Rodowick, ed., Gilles Deleuze, philosophe du cinéma/Gilles Deleuze, philosopher of cinema, special issue of Iris 23 (Spring 1997), 37-52
Benjamin, Walter. Das Kunstwerk im Zeitalter seiner technischen Reproduzierbarkeit [1935] in Gesammelte Werke 1:2, ed. by R. Tiedemann and H. Schweppenhäuser. Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1980., p. 431-469. Engl.: The Work of Art in the Age of its Technological Reproducibility, and other Writings on Media. Boston: Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, 2008.
Bergson, Henri. L’Evolution créatrice Paris: Alcan,1991 [1907].
Bergson, Henri. Matière et memoire. Paris: Presses universitaires françaises, 1939.
Bordwell, David and Noël Carroll, (ed.). Post-Theory: Reconstructing Film Studies. Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 1996.
Bordwell, David. Narration in the Fiction Film. London: Methuen, 1985.
Branigan, Edward. Projecting a Camera: Language-Games in Film Theory. New York: Routledge, 2006.
Buckland, Warren. The Cognitive Semiotics of Film. Cambridge University Press, 2000.
Carroll, Noël. “Film/Mind Analogies: The Case of Hugo Munsterberg“ in Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 46:4, 188, pp. 489-499.
Carroll, Noël. Mystifying Movies: Fads and Fallacies in Contemporary Film Theory. New York: Columbia University Press, 1988.
Carroll, Noel. Philosophical Problems of Classical Film Theory. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988.
Carroll, Noël. Philosophical Problems of Classical Film Theory. Princeton University Press.
Casetti, Francesco. Theories of Cinema 1945-1995. Austin: Texas University Press, 1999.
Cohen-Séat, Gilbert. Essai sur les principes d’une philosophie de cinéma. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1958.
Curran, Angela & Thomas Wartenberg (eds.). The Philosophy of Film. London: Blackwell, 2005.
Davies, David. The Thin Red Line. London: Routledge, 2009.
Deleuze, Gilles & Felix Guattari. Qu’est-ce que la philosophie? Paris: Minuit, 1991. Engl.: What Is Philosophy? (trans. Tomlinson and G. Burchell) Columbia University Press, 1994.
Deleuze, Gilles. Cours de G. Deleuze du 31/01/84, voir www.webdeleuze.com
Deleuze, Gilles. L’Image-mouvement. Cinéma 1. Paris: Minuit Paris, 1983.
Deleuze, Gilles. L’Image-temps. Cinéma 2. Paris: Minuit, 1985. Engl. transl. of both volumes: Cinema (trans. H. Tomlinson and B. Habberjam). Minneapolis : University of Minnesota Press, 1986-1989.
Della Volpe, Galvano. Il verosimile filmico e altri scritti di estetica. Rome: Filmcritica, 1954.
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Author Information

Thorsten Botz-Bornstein
Email: thorstenbotz@hotmail.com
Gulf University
Kuwait

Josiah Royce (1855—1916): Overview

Josiah Royce was one of the most influential philosophers of the period of classical American philosophy, the late nineteenth century through the early twentieth century. Although often identified as an exponent of Absolute Idealism, which is a philosophical view explored by Royce particularly in his Gifford Lectures, Royce was a thinker of widely diverse interests and talents. He made major contributions to psychology including a textbook in the field and was, in fact, elected President of the American Psychological Association. He wrote a history of California, considered today a forerunner of contemporary historiography in its attention to the role of women and minority groups. He explored social ethics, developing many ideas on the social grounding of the self, some of which were later expanded upon by George Herbert Mead. Furthermore, Royce wrote on pressing social and political problems of the day including race relations. W.E.B. Dubois was one of his students. He wrote literary criticism and can be considered the founder of the Harvard school of logic, Boolean algebra, and the foundation of mathematics. Among his students at Harvard were Clarence Irving Lewis who went on to pioneer modal logic, Edward V. Huntington, the first to axiomatize Boolean algebra, and Henry M. Sheffer, known for the eponymous Sheffer stroke. Royce has recently been cited as a proto-cybernetic thinker; another of his students was Norbert Wiener, the father of cybernetics. Royce also wrote on issues in the philosophy of science.

In addition to these many philosophical achievements, Royce made major contributions to the Philosophy of Religion, writing on the problem of evil, and Christian community and presenting a phenomenological study of the religious experience of ordinary people. Royce also wrote throughout his career on ethical theory and on the conditions for creating both genuine and supportive communities as well as creative, unique, ethical individuality. At the end of his life he turned to the development of a world community through a process of mediation and interpretation.

Life
Thought and Works
References and Further Reading

1. Life

Josiah Royce was a Californian by birth, born on 20 November, 1855, in Grass Valley, the son of Josiah (1812-1888) and Sarah Eleanor (Bayliss) Royce (1819-1891), whose families were recent emigrants from England, and who sought their fortune in moving west in 1849. His pioneer mother Sarah was a central figure in forging a new social and political community in Grass Valley. She was the center of much musical activity with her melodeon, the first brought to California. She also helped found a church and served as a teacher of the young, including young Josiah. Under his mother’s tutelage, Josiah developed his love of literature, reading Milton and other literary works; made his acquaintance with the Bible and religious experience; was given an introduction to music and its beauty; and experienced the joys of a warm, loving community, his family, and particularly his mother and sisters. Young Josiah began his literary career with a delightful story of the travels of Pussy Blackie, a “Huckleberry Finn cat,” who runs away from home; gets bitten by a dog; is captured by an eagle; travels on a railroad car; lives in the house of a rich family; finds a cat companion with whom Pussy exchanges stories; discusses social issues such as the contrast between the rich and the poor, as well as the treatment of the less fortunate and moral questions such as honesty, shame, killing, and war. In 1866, the Royce family moved to San Francisco where Royce first attended the Lincoln School. Royce also attended San Francisco Boys’ High School where he had as a classmate the (later famous) physicist, Albert Michelson. Continuing his pioneer trek, Royce entered, at age fourteen, an infant University of California, later becoming one of its first graduates, thus participating in the beginnings of higher education in the state. After receiving his degree in Classics in 1875, Royce traveled to Germany to study philosophy for one year. He mastered the language while attending lectures in Heidelberg, Leipzig, and Göttingen. On his return, he entered the Johns Hopkins University in Baltimore and in 1878, was awarded one of its first four doctorates.

Josiah Royce returned to the University of California, Berkley from 1878-1882. He taught composition, and literature, published numerous philosophical articles and his Primer of Logical Analysis. He married Katherine Head in 1880; the couple had three sons (Christopher, 1882; Edward, 1886; Stephen, 1889) and remained married until Josiah’s death. Royce felt isolated in California, so far from the intellectual life of the East Coast, and he sought an academic post elsewhere. William James, Royce’s friend and philosophical antagonist, secured the opportunity for Royce to replace James at Harvard when James took a one-year sabbatical. In 1882, Royce accepted the position at half of James’ salary and brought his wife and newborn son across the continent to Cambridge, Massachusetts.

At Harvard, Royce began to develop his interest in a number of different areas. In 1885, he published his first major philosophical work, The Religious Aspect of Philosophy, proposing the idea that in order for our ordinary concepts of truth and error to have meaning, there must be an actual infinite mind, an “Absolute Knower,” who encompasses the totality of actual truths and possible errors. That same year, Royce received a permanent appointment as assistant professor at Harvard, where he continued to teach for thirty years. Among his students were such notables as T.S. Eliot, George Santayana, W.E.B. Dubois, Norbert Wiener, and C.I. Lewis, the logician.

Royce was a prolific writer as well as much demanded on the public lecture circuit. In 1886, he published his History of California; he followed this with a published novel in 1887. In 1892, Royce was appointed Professor of the History of Philosophy at Harvard, and he served as Chair of the Department of Philosophy from 1894-1898. During these years Royce established himself as a leading figure in American academic philosophy with his many reviews, lectures and books, including The Spirit of Modern Philosophy, (1892), The Conception of God (1897), and Studies in Good and Evil (1898).

In 1899, and 1900, Royce delivered the prestigious Gifford Lectures at the University of Aberdeen, taking this opportunity to consolidate his thoughts on metaphysics. The result was his two-volume opus, The World and the Individual (1899-1901). This point appeared to be the culmination of Royce’s work. His public reputation was at a high and at 45 years old, Royce was elected President of the American Psychological Association in 1902, and President of the American Philosophical Association in 1903. Reviewers of The World and the Individual praised Royce’s philosophical acumen but there were serious objections to his conclusions. Sparked by these and the criticisms of his logic by Charles Sanders Peirce, Royce began reconsideration of his arguments as well as extensive study in mathematical logic. He also returned to his earlier concerns with philosophy as a means to understand human life, the nature of human society, of religious experience, ethical action, suffering and the problem of evil. His major work on ethics, The Philosophy of Loyalty appeared in 1908, but his concern with ethical issues and the “art” of loyalty continued until his death. He published a collection of essays, Race Questions, Provincialisms, and Other American Problems in 1908 and another, William James and Other Essays on the Philosophy of Life, appeared in 1911.

In 1912, while recovering from a stroke, Royce published The Sources of Religious Insight, in which he sought an explanation for the phenomena of ordinary religious faith as experienced by ordinary religious communities and individuals. He considered this a correction to James’ The Varieties of Religious Experience (The Gifford Lectures, 1901-1902), which, in Royce’s judgment, put too much emphasis on extraordinary and individualistic religious experiences. Drawing on the semiotic of Peirce and other sources, in 1913, Royce published his opus on religious community, The Problem of Christianity, a work which Yale philosopher, John E. Smith identified as “one of the finest works in the philosophy of religion ever to appear on the American scene” (Smith 1982 &1992, 122). In place of the earlier “Absolute Knower,” Royce presents the concept of an infinite community of interpretation, guided by a shared spirit of truth-seeking and community building. The Universal Community constitutes reality, and its understanding increases over time, through its members’ continual development of meaning. Royce’s concern for building a universal or “Beloved Community” is exemplified in two later works focused on building peace and a world community: War and Insurance (1914) and The Hope of the Great Community (1916). In the 1914 book, Royce made a daring political and economic proposal to use the economic power of insurance to mediate hostilities among nations, and reduce the attraction of war in the future.

Royce died September 14, 1916, before he could develop fully his new philosophical insights. Unfortunately, Royce’s works were ignored until recently and now are being revisited by theologians and philosophers interested in not only metaphysics, but also practical and theoretical ethics, philosophy of religion, philosophy of self and of community.

2. Thought and Works

Royce’s major works include The Religious Aspect of Philosophy (1885), The World and the Individual (1899-1901), The Spirit of Modern Philosophy (1892), The Philosophy of Loyalty (1908), and The Problem of Christianity (1913). In his early works, Royce presented a novel defense of idealism, the “argument from error,” and arrived at the concept of an actual infinite mind, an “Absolute Knower,” that encompasses all truths and possible errors. The correspondence theory of truth requires that if an idea or judgment is true it must correctly represent its object; when an idea does not correctly represent its object, it is an error. Royce begins with the fact that the human mind often makes such errors and yet, argued Royce, the mind “intends” or “points to” the idea’s true object. Thus, the occurrence of these errors indicates that the true object of any idea must exist, in a fully determinate state, in some actual infinite mind; this actual infinite “Mind” is the “Absolute Knower.” Royce continued to pursue this move toward Idealism in The World and the Individual. Here we find Royce agreeing with Kantian critical rationalism that a true idea is one that may be fulfilled or validated by a possible experience, but he argued that such a possibility of experience required the existence of an actual being, whose nature was to be the true object of the experience. In this work, Royce engages in criticism of three major views of metaphysics, Realism, Mysticism, and Kant’s Critical Rationalism. He finds valuable points in all three views, but also critical weaknesses. He advocates a “Fourth Conception of Being,” a view of the totality of Being as an actual Infinite, timeless, and encompassing all valid past, present, and future possible experience of fact including the facts of all finite beings.

Royce continued to develop his thoughts spurred by various criticisms and particularly the friendly but longstanding dispute with William James known as “The Battle of the Absolute.” In addition, he struggled with the problem of community and the relations of the individual and community both philosophically and practically, the latter concern evidenced in his writings on the history of California, the land disputes in California, various public problems and his deep concern for a solid theory of ethics. In answer to Charles Sanders Peirce, he turned to a deep exploration of logic, mathematics, and semiotics. In his later works, Royce dispenses with the “Absolute Mind/Knower” of previous works and develops a metaphysical view which characterizes reality as a universe of ideas or signs which occur in the process of being interpreted by an ongoing, infinite community of minds. These minds and the community they constitute also become signs for further interpretation. In The Problem of Christianity he sees representation no longer as a static, one-time experience, but as having creative, synthetic and selective aspects and knowledge is now more than accurate and completed perception of an object, or complete conception of an idea, it is a process of interpretation. This new metaphysical view is reflected in Royce’s work on ethics, philosophy of religion, philosophy of community, social philosophy and logic.

a. Royce’s Philosophy of Community

Royce was concerned about the impact of an extreme individualism and particularly with the “heroic individualism” associated with Walt Whitman, Ralph Waldo Emerson, and William James. Though inspiring as ethical visions, Royce believed these views eventually proved unsatisfactory for ethical life. While affirming the “individual” as a “most fundamental phenomenon,” he sought to address the problem of forming satisfactory communities and dealing with competing forms of community. In his later metaphysics Royce affirms the full-fledged reality of both individuals and community. In the practical social and political realm, Royce tackled the dual issues of “enlightened/genuine individualism,” and “true/genuine community.” He recognized that the task of building authentic individuality and encouraging the growth of fulfilling, moral communities were inextricably bound together—worthwhile individuality and community arising out of their mutual interaction in a creative, ongoing, infinite process.

Thus, Royce develops the following claims: (1) individuals are inextricably rooted in the social context and true individuality is forged out of that context. An individual is both self-made and a social product and the worthiness of the end result, the individual self, is the responsibility of both individual and community; (2) community is a social product, but true community is created by the hard work of free, self-conscious, self-committed, self-creative moral individuals; (3) the task of the individual is both to fashion a “beautiful life” and to build a “beautiful” community, while the obligation of community is to build a harmony of wills while also fostering the development of true individuals; (4) individuals are finite, sinful and fallible and need to extend self to develop morality and overcome error. Furthermore, individuals crave harmony and relationship. Individuals keep communities alive, moral, and sane by keeping them from stagnating into inveterate habit, moving toward exclusivity and intolerance, or degenerating into mob madness. In other words, stress must be equally on the individual and the community. For Royce, “individuals without community are without substance, while communities without individuals are blind.”

In light of the strong individualistic emphasis in philosophy today, it is striking that for Royce communities are logically prior to individuals. For Royce, there is no personal identity unless there are communities of persons that provide causes and social roles for individuals to embrace. Royce declares: “My life means nothing, either theoretically or practically, unless I am a member of a community” (Royce 2001 [1913], 357). And community is more than any association or collection of individuals; communities can only exist, in Royce’s view, where individual members are in communication with one another and there exists to some relevant way a congruence of feeling, thought and will among them. A community is for Royce, as is the human self, a temporal being. He speaks of a community of memory and ac community of hope. Each of the community’s members accepts, as part of his/her own individual life and self, some past events and the same expected future events. And, like human selves, communities are “plans of action” engaged in purposive activity in the world and constituting a will and a spirit and, for Royce, also, like human selves, morally responsible for its communal actions.

b. Royce’s Ethics: The Philosophy of Loyalty

At the center of Royce’s ethics is his contention that to lead a morally significant life, one’s actions must express a self-consciously asserted will; the self is a plan of action, a plan of life created by an individual out of the chaos of many conflicting personal desires and impulses. Such a plan is forged when one finds a cause, or causes which require a program or programs of implementation that extend through time and requires the contributions of many individuals for their advancement and fulfillment. When an individual finds a cause judged worthwhile, his/her will becomes focused and defined in terms of that cause and furthermore, the individual becomes allied with a community of others who are also committed to that same cause. Royce calls this commitment “loyalty” and thus the moral life of an individual is understood in terms of the multiple loyalties that a person embraces. “There is only one way to be an ethical individual. That is to choose your cause, and then to serve it” (Royce 1995 [l908], 47).

According to Royce’s careful definition of loyalty, “genuine” loyalty is intended to rule out loyalty to morally evil causes and communities that serve them. Royce fully recognized that many of the worst deed in human history have involved a high degree of loyalty, but, argued Royce, these loyalties were directed exclusively to a particular group and expressed in the destruction of the conditions for others’ loyal actions, Royce describes the difference between true loyalty and vicious or “predatory” loyalty as follows:

A cause is good, not only for me, but for mankind, in so far, as it is essentially a “loyalty to loyalty,” that is, an aid, and a furtherance of loyalty in my fellows. It is an evil cause in so far as, despite the loyalty that it arouses in me, it is destructive of loyalty in the world of my fellows (Royce 1995 {1908}, 56).

Communities defined by true loyalty, or adherence to a cause that exemplifies the universal ideal of “loyalty to loyalty” are referred to by Royce as “genuine communities.” Again, the degenerate communities are those that tend toward the destruction of other’s causes and possibilities of loyalty. While every community works for the accomplishment of its central cause, Royce places significant emphasis on the idea of loyalty to a “lost cause.” A lost cause is not a hopeless cause but rather one that cannot be fulfilled within the actual lifetime of any of its members. These causes are those that are “lost” simply in virtue of their scope and magnitude and these are precisely the causes that establish ideals capable of evoking our highest hope and moral commitment. “Lost causes” are indispensable, in Royce’s view, as the source of absolute norms for any community and its members.

For Royce, chief among such causes is the full attainment of truth, the complete determination of the nature of reality through inquiry and interpretation. Thus, the formula of “loyalty to loyalty” demands that one’s moral and intellectual sphere become ever broader and remain critical at all levels. In this connection, Royce reframed two central ideas or principles of pragmatism. Following James in his essay, “The Will to Believe,” Royce agreed that any philosophical view is essentially an expression of individual volition. We must first decide how we are to approach the world and then develop our philosophical theories accordingly. For Royce, the essential attitude of will that one must adopt toward the world is “loyalty to the ideal of an ultimate truth.” Secondly, Royce adopted the pragmatist view of truth, that is, truth is the property possessed by those ideas that succeed in the long run. And, following Peirce, Royce argues that to define truth using any conception of “the long run, short of the ideal end of inquiry, is self-refuting.” Having adopted these pragmatic principles, Royce referred to his own position as “Absolute Pragmatism.”

Returning to the principles of “loyalty to loyalty,” it becomes clear that, for Royce, all communities we actually know, inhabit, or identify with, are finite and to varying degrees “predatory.” Roycean loyalty requires one to scrutinize the aims and actions of our communities and those of others and to work to reform the disloyal aspects. The philosophy of loyalty calls upon us to create and embrace more cosmopolitan and inclusive communities. However, any human community, however, inclusive and committed to loyalty to loyalty, will fall short of perfect loyalty. Each community must constantly engage in critical scrutiny and actions of reform. For Royce, there is no expectation that the high ideals of perfect loyalty, truth, and reality will ever be fully realized. The process of building community is an ongoing, infinite process.

Finally, for Royce, beyond the actual communities that we directly encounter in life there is the ideal “Beloved Community” of all those who would be fully dedicated to the cause of loyalty, truth, and reality itself. This is the ultimate goal and cause. Furthermore, the sharing of individuals’ feeling, thoughts and wills in a community (including the Beloved Community) is never, for Royce, a mystical blurring or annihilation of personal identities. Individuals remain individuals, but in forming a community they build or attain a second order life that extends beyond any of their individuals lives. This life is a life coordinated through a cause and extended over time, a super-human personality at work, a community united by an “interpreting spirit.” Again, communities are more than their individual members and individuals are always unique and not lost in their communities; individuals and communities need each other.

c. Religion

Through the strong influence of his mother, Sarah Royce, and the early education she provided him and his sisters, Royce was well acquainted with the Christian Protestant world view and his writings exhibited a consistent familiarity with Scripture and with religious themes. Royce, in his own life did not embrace organized Christianity, and he was critical of many historical churches, believing that they had lost sight of the “spirit” of community that ought to guide them. He identified many “communities of grace,” genuine communities of loyalty, that were non-Christian or not self-consciously religious. Royce had a great respect for Buddhism and he even learned Sanskrit to study religious texts in this language. Although Royce maintained a strong interest in logic, science, evolutionary theory, and natural philosophy throughout his career, religious concerns did figure prominently in a number of his works beginning with his first major publication, The Religious Aspect of Philosophy as well as in his last two major works, The Sources of Religious Insight and The Problem of Christianity. The Sources was Royce’s response to the Gifford Lectures delivered by William James in 1901-1902 and published as The Varieties of Religious experience. James’ lectures were a popular and academic success and remain so even today. Royce, however, believed that James placed too much emphasis on the extraordinary religious experience of extraordinary individuals and thus failed to capture the religious experiences of the ordinary individual. Furthermore, Royce believed that religion was a central phenomenon of human experience that could not be ignored by philosophers. In The Problem of Christianity Royce works out his own religious thought and his full-blown theory of community. He maintains that the Christian model of the “loyal community,” properly understood, successfully combined the true spirit of universal interpretation with an appreciation of the “infinite worth” of the individual as a unique member of the ideal Beloved Community, the Kingdom of Heaven (Royce 2001[1913], 193). It is in this book that Royce also brings to fruition his thought and concern with the problem of evil.

Royce’s approach to religion was empirical, historical and phenomenological as well as concerned with philosophical reflection. Thus, in a 1909 essay, “What is Vital in Christianity?,” Royce approaches religion with a historic-empirical approach akin to modern anthropology. He views the religion as it has developed within human history. He writes: “any religion presents itself as a more or less connected group: (1) of religious practices, such as prayers, ceremonies, festivals, rituals and other observance, and (2) of religious ideas, the ideas taking the form of traditions, legends, and beliefs about the gods or spirits” (Royce 1911 [1909], 101). The term “vital,” says Royce, is metaphoric, such as the “vital” features of an organism. If these changed the organism would not necessarily be destroyed but would be an essentially different type of organism. Royce illustrates with the features, gill breathing” and “lung breathing.” But “vital,” also connotes “alive” for the persons who are followers of the religion and this usage is similar to Paul Tillich’s understanding of religious symbols as alive or dying. Furthermore, this term means also “primary” in practice. Thus, Royce says his first question is: “What is more vital about a religion: its religious practices, or its religious ideas, beliefs, and spiritual attitudes?” In this essay, in a humorous passage about pigeons in the Harvard Yard observing the habits of humans who feed them and concluding to the existence of a benevolent creator, Royce critiques the causal approach to God, represented in many of the proofs for God’s existence.

Royce again approaches religion through a historical-philosophical analysis in an encyclopedia article entitled “Monotheism.” After briefly reviewing monotheism as a doctrine in contrast to polytheism and pantheism, Royce makes the following claim: “…from the historical point of view, three different ways of viewing the divine being have been of great importance both for religious life and for philosophical doctrine” (Royce 1916, 818). The three ways to which Royce refers are three forms of monotheism, which were established in India, Greece, and Israel.

Royce then discusses, what in his view, are the essential features of monotheism as developed in these three cultural contexts. From Israel, we have “the ethical monotheism of the Prophets of Israel,” and “God,” in this religious context is defined as “the righteous Ruler of the world,” as the “Doer of justice,” or as the one “whose law is holy” or “who secures the triumph of the right”(Royce, 1916). Turning to Greece and to “Hellenistic monotheism,” God is defined as the “source, of the explanation, or the correlate, or the order, or the reasonableness of the world” (Royce, 1916). The third type of monotheism is labeled “Hindu pantheism.” Royce notes that this understanding had many different historical origins and appeared, in fact, as part of the Neo-Platonic philosophy and the philosophy of Spinoza. This type of monotheism insists not only upon the “sole” reality of God, but also asserts the “unreality of the world” (Royce, 1916).

In an interesting move, Royce argues that the “whole history of Christian monotheism depends upon an explicit effort to make a synthesis of the ethical monotheism of Israel and the Hellenic form of monotheism (Royce, 1916) This effort, however, says Royce, has proven especially difficult. The Hellenic tradition with its intellectualistic emphasis on the Logos was in favor of defining the unity of the divine being and the world as the essential feature of monotheism, whereas ethical monotheism dwells upon the contrast between the righteous Ruler and the sinful world, and between divine grace and fallen man. Royce, then, concludes:

Therefore, behind many of the conflicts between the so-called pantheism in Christian tradition and the doctrines of “divine transcendence” and “divine personality,” there has lain the conflict between intellectualism and voluntarism, between an interpretation of the world in terms of order and an interpretation of the world in terms of the conflict between good and evil, righteousness and unrighteousness (Royce, 1916, 819).

This history is made even more complex, says Royce, due to the influence of the Indic type of God. This concept influenced mysticism and, of course, Neo-platonic philosophy which, in turn, influenced Christian philosophy and theology. Augustine is a prime example of this influence. Furthermore, within Christianity, the mystics have often pointed to the failure to resolve the conflict with the moral and intellectual interests. Royce writes:

The mystics…have always held that the results of the intellect are negative and lead to no definite idea of God which can be defended against the skeptics, while…to follow the law of righteousness, whether or not with the aid of divine grace, does not lead, at least in the present life, to the highest type of knowledge of God (Royce, 1916).

Then, Royce, with his respect for the experiential in religion, writes: “Without this third type of monotheism, and without this negative criticism of the work of the intellect, and this direct appeal to immediate experience, Christian doctrine, in fact, would not have reached some of its most characteristic forms and expressions, and the philosophy of Christendom would have failed to put on record some of its most fascinating speculations” (Royce, 1916).

Royce then reviews the history of the so-called “proofs for God’s existence,” generally an expression of the Hellenistic influence in Christianity, and says that there is some basis in the claim that these efforts to grasp the divine nature via the intellect leads to results remote “from the vital experience upon which religious monotheism, and in particular, Christian monotheism must rest, if such…is permanently to retain the confidence of a man who is at once critical and religious (Royce, 1916).

Finally, it is not surprising that Royce argues that whatever answers to the questions about the nature of the world – is it real, rational, ethical? – that are developed must not put exclusive emphasis on any one characteristic. For, “as we have seen, the problem of monotheism requires a synthesis of all the three ideas of God,” thus any attempt to address these three questions must be an answer that does adequate justice to the three ideas and the three problems (Royce, 1916). Royce’s own efforts were aimed at achieving this synthesis and providing an answer to these three questions. Thus, he sought in his conceptions of God to give an account of the nature of reality that would satisfy the “moral insight,” “the theoretic insight,” and the “religious insight.” And the three Conceptions of Being addressed in The World and the Individual embody aspects of the three ideas of God and address the three questions.

Turning now to The Sources of Religious Insight, as indicated earlier, it is a parallel to The Varieties of Religious Experience by William James, yet it transcends that work in a number of ways. First, it explores religious experience common to much of mankind rather than the special, genius cases that are the subject of James’ work. Second, it studies both individual and communal religious experience whereas James’ work focuses on the experiences of extraordinary individuals. Third, The Sources is solidly based in the empirical and experiential. Royce writes: “The issue will be one regarding the facts of living experience” (Royce, 1912). James, in his work seeks to explain man’s religious need in terms of an experience that wells up from the subliminal self, from the soundless depths of our own subconscious. Royce, on the other hand, asserts that, “the principal religious motives are indeed perfectly natural human motives” (Royce, 1912,41-42). Man’s religious experience is, as a natural process, an incident in the history of his sensitive life, of his personal interpretation of the world, and of his more or less creative effort to fulfill his needs, and to respond in his own way to the universe. Religious experience, then, for Royce, is natural and profoundly personal and social – it is the experience of a human self in the history of his own life, set in the material, historical, social, and cultural context of that individual history and life.

Beginning then with human experience and needs, Royce seeks to get at the heart of “religious experience.” He states that the “central and essential postulate” of every religion is that “man needs to be saved” (Royce 2001[1912], 8-9). Salvation is necessary, for Royce, for two reasons: (1) There is some aim or end of human life which is more important than all other aims; and (2) Man, as he now is, or is naturally, is always in great danger of missing this highest aim and thus to render his whole life “a senseless failure” (Royce 2001 [1912], 12). This salvation must come in the form of guidance about understanding and achieving the highest aim of life so far as one is able. But given the limitations and fallibility of the human perspective, which hardly extends “beyond one’s nose,” Royce contends that this needed guidance must come from some super-human source. Religion, then, is the sphere of life in which finite human beings are able to get in touch with this source. It is interesting that in seeking to demonstrate the validity of his postulate he reviews the essentials of Buddhism, the writings of Plato in The Republic, and various literary sources. He believes that these examples show that the search for salvation belongs to no “one type of piety or of poetry or of philosophy” (Royce, 1912, 15).

The next major question is “what are the sources of insight?” Royce will consider seven sources, beginning with the human self, viewed first as uniquely individual and then as social. These are the basic and most elementary. However, Royce will find individual life and social life insufficient to meet the religious need for salvation. He then turns to five other sources. These are all dependent on the first two sources but will develop, strengthen, correct and transform in some way these. The five are: reason as a synthesizing power; the will or the volitional; loyalty; the religious mission of sorrow, and the unified community of the spirit.

In turning to the individual alone with his problem of salvation and with his efforts to know the divine that can save, Royce asserts that the individual can be in touch with a genuine source of insight, one of value, although also a source with limits. There are, says Royce, three objects which individual experience, as a source of religious insight, can reveal: The Ideal, the Need, and the Deliverer. The Ideal is, of course, the standard in terms of which the individual estimates the sense and value of his personal life. The Need for salvation is that degree to which he falls short of attaining his ideal and is sundered from this Ideal by evil fortune, his own paralysis of will, or by his inward baseness. The Deliverer is that presence, that power, that light, that truth, that great companion who helps the individual and saves him from his need.

We as humans are creatures of wavering and conflicting motives and, although we strongly desire a unity that makes life meaningful, we, on our own, cannot find this unity; we always miss our mark. Furthermore, we have glimpses of what would fulfill us, what would meet our need: a life “infinitely richer than our own.” As James, argues, we want to get in touch with something that will give us a “new dimension” to our lives. We want something more. Furthermore, for Royce, our need and desire are crucial. Royce writes: “Unless you have inwardly felt the need of salvation and learned to hunger and thirst after spiritual unity and self-possession, all the rest of religious insight is to you a sealed book” (Royce 1912, 33).

However, the individual alone cannot achieve what is needed. Thus we must turn to the social and to shared human life to attain a broader religious insight. Royce writes: “…no one who remains content with his merely individual experience of the presence of the divine and of his deliverer, has won the whole of any true insight. For as a fact, we are all members one of another; and I can have no insight into the way of my salvation unless I thereby learn of the way of salvation for all my brethren. And there is no unity of the spirit unless all men are privileged to enter it whenever they see it and know it and love it” (Royce, 1912, 34). Here is Royce’s emphasis on the need for social expansion of the self, as loyalty to loyalty demands expansion of the perspective of the community. Indeed, Royce argues that one of the principal sources of our need for salvation is our narrowness of view and especially of the meaning of our own purposes and motives. The social world, as Royce has constantly argued, broadens our outlook; an individual corrects his own narrowness by trying to share his fellow’s point of view. Social responsibilities can set limits to our fickleness; social discipline can keep us from indulging all our caprices; human companionship may steady our vision. The social world may bring us in touch with our public, great self, wherein we may find our “soul and its interests writ large” (Royce, 1912, 55). Social life is a source of religious insight and the insight it can bring is knowledge of “salvation through the fostering of human brotherhood” (Royce, 1912, 58).

Another avenue to religious insight, for Royce, is the experience of moral suffering, of the deep sense of guilt accompanied by the belief that one is an outcast from human sympathy and is hopelessly alone. He illustrates this with two literary examples: “The Ancient Mariner” and Raskolnikov in Crime and Punishment. The central conception in these two literary pieces is of salvation as reconciliation both with the social and the divine order, an escape from the wilderness of lonely guilt to the realm where men can understand one another.

This brings us directly to the “religious mission of sorrow.” Sorrows are defined by Royce as evils that we can assimilate. These become part of a constructive process, which involves growth rather than destruction, a passage to a new life. We takes these sorrows up into our plan of life, give them new meaning as they become part of a new whole. This was Royce’s emphasis in his essays on the problem of evil as well as in Religious Aspect and The Spirit. This will be discussed more in the section on the Problem of Evil.

The stage is now set for The Problem of Christianity. Christianity is viewed as a “philosophy of life,” and the question Royce asks is “In what sense, if any, can the modern man consistently be, in creed, a Christian?” (Royce, 2001 [1913], 62). In focusing on “creed,” however, Royce is clear that he is not concerned here with dogma or with particular theological beliefs. Rather he seeks the essentially “vital” and living ideas that will find expression in communal practices and religious-moral living and that will speak to all humanity. Royce will focus on living religious experience as was expressed in the early Pauline Christian communities. Royce’s focus is on the incarnation of the Spirit in the living Church, it is the Church, rather than the person of the founder that is the central idea of Christianity. For Royce, the essence of Christianity is its stress on the “saving community.” Royce writes: “The thesis of this book is that the essence of Christianity, as the Apostle Paul stated that essence, depends upon regarding the being which the early Christian Church believed itself to represent, and the being which I call…the ‘Beloved Community,’ as the true source, through loyalty, of the salvation of man” (Royce, 2001 [1913], 45).

It is indeed the “community” which allows us to understand more fully the teachings of the Master. Of Jesus’ teaching, Royce found two ideas especially crucial: his preaching of love and the “Kingdom of Heaven.” Both were mysterious and in need of interpretation. Thus, “love” is a mystery for although we know we are to love God and our neighbor, the question is how. How can I be practically useful in meeting my neighbor’s needs? Anyone who has tried to be benevolent or to meet the needs of others knows that there can be a huge crevice between your interpretation of what that person needs and their belief in that matter. It is the interpretation of Jesus’ teachings in the letters of Paul that make the difference for Royce. That which can make the loving of our neighbor less mysterious and difficult is community, for a community “when united by an active developing purpose is an entity more concrete, and, in fact, less mysterious than any individual man (Royce, 2001 [1913] 94). In community, we can come to know each other, to see what each other’s needs are. I need not ask “who is my neighbor?” for my neighbor and I are both members of one and the same community.

The essence of Christianity, for Royce, is contained in three ideas. The first of these is that the source and means of salvation is the community of believers. Community is also the basis of the ethic of love taught by Jesus. The other two essential ideas are: “the moral burden of the individual and “atonement.” These are addressed in the section on evil.

d. The Problem of Evil

Josiah Royce struggled with the problem of evil throughout his life, exploring it from various approaches, and asserting that it could neither be avoided nor dismissed by either the philosopher or the ordinary person. Thus, unlike some philosophers, he did not believe the problem of evil could be solved as a practical problem that only required improving social conditions. As a native Californian, a historian, and a social observer of the development of early California, Royce explored ways in which evil manifested itself in social relations among persons, in social bodies infected with racism, greed, and in a variety of harmful prejudices, in expressions of hate and in mob violence. Ultimately, Royce embraced a theistic process metaphysics that recognizes evil as a real force and suffering as an irreducible fact of experience. In his 1897 essay, “The Problem of Job,” Royce presents a fairly succinct overview of the problem of evil, various solutions and his own view on a possible solution. In the Job story, we have a traditional view of God as wise, omnipotent, all powerful, and all good and the situation of Job, namely, a universal situation of unearned ill-fortune, a seeming persecution of a righteous person and a reigning down of evils on a good man. For Royce, Job represents the fundamental psychological fact about the problem of evil, namely, the universal experience of unearned ill-fortune. This, asserts Royce, is the experience of every person, the kind of evil that all persons can see for themselves every day if they choose. This is the fundamental experiential and psychological fact that grounds Royce’s own answers to the problem of evil and also his dismissal of the various traditional answers to the problem of evil. Thus, for example there is the view that the purpose of the world is “soul making,” that pain teaches us the ways of the world and helps us develop our higher potentialities. Royce believes this answer is inadequate because it presupposes a greater evil, namely a world which allows evils as the only way to reach given goals. Such an answer Royce believes is unacceptable to a sufferer of evil and undeserved ills.

Another answer to the problem of evil is the infinite worth of agents with free will. Royce finds value in this view in that it acknowledges evil as a logically necessary part of a perfect moral order, but he believes this answer ultimately fails. A major problem is Job’s situation, namely, the innocent sufferer. Such unearned ills may be partly due to the free will that partly caused them, but, asserts Royce, the unearned ills are also due to God who declines to protect the innocent.

Royce believes that as long as one views God as an external power, as Job did, the problem of evil cannot be solved. Rather, one must recognize God as internally present to us and as suffering with us to produce the higher good. When we suffer, our sufferings are God’s sufferings and this is the case because without suffering, evil, and tragedy, God’s life could not be perfected. Furthermore, asserts Royce, personal overcoming evil is the essence of the moral life. Persons are instruments of God’s triumph. Thus, in The Sources of Religious Insight, Royce presents man as a destroyer of evil, a being who uses every effort to get rid of evil. Conquering evils and oppressions provide man’s greatest opportunities for loyalty and here is the source of religious insight and spiritual triumph. The encounter of human selves with the problem of evil is, for Royce, the most important moral aspect of the world. One must see the problematic situation into which human selves are immersed as part of the atoning process which tends toward an ultimate reconciliation of finite conflicts. Confronted with evils, one needs to trust within one’s limited view that the Spirit of the Universal Community reconciles.

Ultimately, Royce sees evil as an eternal part of both human and divine consciousness and the most important moral fact of the universe the human conquering of evil step by step. In addressing the doctrine of atonement in The Problem, Royce sets out in detail how the loyal community can best respond to human evil. The highest transgression in an ethics of loyalty is treason, or the willful betrayal of one’s own cause and the community of people who serve it. Such a betrayal is moral suicide for it threatens to destroy the network of purposes and social relationships that define the traitor’s self. The traitor is in what Royce calls “the hell of the irrevocable” (Royce, 2001 [1913], 162). Royce seeks an explanation of atonement which acknowledges this irrevocable nature of the deed that has been done, and which changes everything for the sinner and the community that has been harmed. None of the tradition Christian accounts of atonement are satisfactory. The answer, for Royce, is that the act of atonement can only be accomplished by the community, or on the behalf of the community, through the steadfast “loyal servant who acts, so to speak, as the incarnation of the spirit of the community itself” (Royce, 2011 [1913], 180). This person serves as a mediating party between the traitor and the betrayed community and through the atoning act genuine community is restored and all the individuals may emerge as wiser, more commitment servants of their common cause. Things are not the same as before the treason but, in fact, transformed and better. Royce then states what he believes to be the central postulate of the highest form of human spirituality, namely, that “No baseness or cruelty of treason so deep or so tragic shall enter our human world, but that loyal love shall be able in due time to oppose to just that deed of treason its fitting deed of atonement” (Royce 2001 [1913], 186). In the spirit of James, Royce asserts that this postulate cannot be proven true, but human communities can assert it and act upon it as it is were true.

e. Logic

Royce pursued his interest in logic, mathematics and science throughout his career. His first published book was a Primer of Logical Analysis for the Use of Composition Students, written for his students in California in 1881. His own proposal for a system of formal logic was published as “The Relation of the Principles of Logic to the Foundations of Geometry” in 1905, a work later extended in 1914. Among his last writings were a series of encyclopedia articles on logical topics: Axiom, Error and Truth, Mind, Negation, and Order (all reprinted in Robinson, 1951).

In addition to his discussion of science in The Religious Aspect of Philosophy, The World and the Individual, and in The Problem of Christianity, Royce published a series of articles on scientific method:” The Mechanical, Historical and the Statistical,” “The Social Character of Scientific Inquiry,” (in Josiah Royce’s Late Writings); Hypotheses and Leading Ideas,” and Introduction to H. Poincaré, The Foundations of Science (reprinted in Robinson). Like Peirce, Royce argued for the self-corrective nature of the scientific method; the necessity of experience as the starting point of inquiry; an emphasis on scientific instinct and imaginative judgment in forming hypotheses; the requirement of a proper motive – the search for truth and not fame or profit – as a necessary condition, along with the correct method, for the success of science and essence of science, the notion of science as a communal endeavor, dependent on the contributions of many others, past, present and future, and finally for the thoroughly human and fallible nature of science.

3. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Royce, Josiah, Primer of Logical Analysis for the Use of Composition Students, San Francisco, California: A.L. Bancroft and Co., 1881.
Royce, Josiah, The Religious Aspect of Philosophy: A critique of the Bases of Conduct and Faith, Boston, New York: Houghton Mifflin & Co., 1885.
Royce, Josiah, California from the Conquest in 1846 to the Second Vigilance Committee in San Francisco [1856]: A Study of American Character, Boston and New York: Houghton, Mifflin and Co. 1886.
Royce, Josiah, The Spirit of Modern Philosophy: An Essay in the Form of Lectures, Boston: Houghton Mifflin, 1892.
Royce, Josiah, The Conception of God: A Philosophical Discussion Concerning the Nature of the Divine Idea as a Demonstrable Reality, New York: The Macmillan Co, 1897. This includes commentary by Joseph LeConte, George Holmes Howison, and Sidney Edward Mezes.
Royce, Josiah, Studies in Good and Evil, New York, Appleton, 1898.
Royce, Josiah, The World and the Individual, 2 vols., New York: Macmillan, 1899.
Royce, Josiah, Outlines of Psychology: An Elementary Treatise with Some Practical Applications, New York: Macmillan, 1903.
Royce, Josiah, The Philosophy of Loyalty, New York: Macmillan, 1908.
Royce, Josiah, Race Questions, Provincialism, and Other American Problems, New York: Macmillan, 1908.
Royce, Josiah, William James and Other Essays on the Philosophy of Life, New York: Macmillan, 1911.
Royce, Josiah, The Sources of Religious Insight, Washington, D.C.: Catholic University of America Press, 2001 [1913]. Also at http://www.iupui.edu/~iat/royce/.
Royce, Josiah, The Problem of Christianity, Washington, D.C.: Catholic University of America Press, 2001 [1913].
Royce, Josiah, War and Insurance, New York: Macmillan, 1914.
Royce, Josiah, The Hope of the Great Community, New York: Macmillan, 1916.

b. Published Editions

Robinson, D.S., ed. Royce’s Logical Essays: Collected Logical Essays of Josiah Royce, Dubuque, Iowa: W. C. Brown, 1951.
McDermott, J.J., ed. The Basic Writings of Josiah Royce, New York: Fordham University Press, 2 vols., 2005 [1969].
Clendenning, J., Ed. The Letters of Josiah Royce, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1970.
Oppenheim, F., ed. Josiah Royce’s Late Writings: A Collection of Unpublished and Scattered Works, Bristol: Thoemmes Press, 2 vols.

c. Secondary Sources

Auxier, R, ed., Critical Responses to Josiah Royce, 1885-1916, Bristol: Thoemmes Press, 3 vols., 2000.
Auxier, R, Time, Will, and Purpose: Living Ideas From the Philosophy of Josiah Royce, Open Court, 2011.
Clendenning, The Life and Thought of Josiah Royce, revised and expanded ed., Nashville, Tennessee: Vanderbilt University Press, 1999.
Kegley, J., Genuine Individuals and Genuine Communities: A Roycean Public Philosophy, Nashville, Tennessee, 1997.
Kegley, J. Josiah Royce in Focus, Bloomington, Indiana: Indiana University Press, 2008.
Kiklick, B., Josiah Royce: An Intellectual Biography, Indianapolis, Indiana: Hackett Publishing Company, Inc., 1985.
Marcel, G., Royce’s Metaphysics, trans. V. and G. Ringer, Chicago: Henry Regnery Company, 1956. This was originally published as La Mėtaphysique de Royce, Paris, 1945.
Oppenheim, F.M. Royce’s Voyage Down Under: A Journey of the Mind, Lexington: University of Kentucky Press, 1980.
Oppenheim, F.M., Royce’s Mature Philosophy of Religion, Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press, 1987.
Oppenheim, F.M., Royce’s Mature Ethics, Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press, 1993.
Oppenheim, F.M., Reverence for the Relations of Life: Re-examining Pragmatism via Josiah Royce’s Interactions with Peirce, James, and Dewey, Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press, 2005.
Smith, J.E. Royce South Infinite: The Community of Interpretation, Hamden, Conn.: Archon Books, 1969.
Tunstall, Dwayne, Yes, but Not Quite: Encountering Josiah Royce’s Ethico-Religious Insight, New York: Fordham University Press, 2009.
Trotter, G., On Royce, Belmont, California: Wadsworth, 2001.

Author Information

Jacquelyn Ann K. Kegley
Email: jkegley@csub.edu
California State University Bakersfield
U. S. A.

Arthur Schopenhauer (1788—1860)

Arthur Schopenhauer has been dubbed the artist’s philosopher on account of the inspiration his aesthetics has provided to artists of all stripes. He is also known as the philosopher of pessimism, as he articulated a worldview that challenges the value of existence. His elegant and muscular prose earns him a reputation as one of the greatest German stylists. Although he never achieved the fame of such post-Kantian philosophers as Johann Gottlieb Fichte and G.W.F. Hegel in his lifetime, his thought informed the work of such luminaries as Sigmund Freud, Ludwig Wittgenstein and, most famously, Friedrich Nietzsche. He is also known as the first German philosopher to incorporate Eastern thought into his writings.

Schopenhauer’s thought is iconoclastic for a number of reasons. Although he considered himself Kant’s only true philosophical heir, he argued that the world was essentially irrational. Writing in the era of German Romanticism, he developed an aesthetics that was classicist in its emphasis on the eternal. When German philosophers were entrenched in the universities and immersed in the theological concerns of the time, Schopenhauer was an atheist who stayed outside the academic profession.

Schopenhauer’s lack of recognition during most of his lifetime may have been due to the iconoclasm of his thought, but it was probably also partly due to his irascible and stubborn temperament. The diatribes against Hegel and Fichte peppered throughout his works provide evidence of his state of mind. Regardless of the reason Schopenhauer’s philosophy was overlooked for so long, he fully deserves the prestige he enjoyed altogether too late in his life.

Schopenhauer’s Life
Schopenhauer’s Thought
1. The World as Will and Representation
  1. Schopenhauer’s Metaphysics and Epistemology
  2. The Ideas and Schopenhauer’s Aesthetics
2. The Human Will
  1. Agency and Freedom
  2. Ethics
Schopenhauer’s Pessimism
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources Available in English
2. Secondary Sources

1. Schopenhauer’s Life

Arthur Schopenhauer was born on February 22, 1788 in Danzig (now Gdansk, Poland) to a prosperous merchant, Heinrich Floris Schopenhauer, and his much younger wife, Johanna. The family moved to Hamburg when Schopenhauer was five, because his father, a proponent of enlightenment and republican ideals, found Danzig unsuitable after the Prussian annexation. His father wanted Arthur to become a cosmopolitan merchant like himself and hence traveled with Arthur extensively in his youth. His father also arranged for Arthur to live with a French family for two years when he was nine, which allowed Arthur to become fluent in French. From an early age, Arthur wanted to pursue the life of a scholar. Rather than force him into his own career, Heinrich offered a proposition to Arthur: the boy could either accompany his parents on a tour of Europe, after which time he would apprentice with a merchant, or he could attend a gymnasium in preparation for attending university. Arthur chose the former option, and his witnessing firsthand on this trip the profound suffering of the poor helped shape his pessimistic philosophical worldview.

After returning from his travels, Arthur began apprenticing with a merchant in preparation for his career. When Arthur was 17 years old, his father died, most likely as a result of suicide. Upon his death, Arthur, his sister Adele, and his mother were each left a sizable inheritance. Two years following his father’s death, with the encouragement of his mother, Schopenhauer freed himself of his obligation to honor the wishes of his father, and he began attending a gymnasium in Gotha. He was an extraordinary pupil: he mastered Greek and Latin while there, but was dismissed from the school for lampooning a teacher.

In the meantime his mother, who was by all accounts not happy in the marriage, used her newfound freedom to move to Weimar and become engaged in the social and intellectual life of the city. She met with great success there, both as a writer and as a hostess, and her salon became the center of the intellectual life of the city with such luminaries as Johann Wolfgang von Goethe, the Schlegel brothers (Karl Wilhelm Friedrich and August Wilhelm), and Christoph Martin Wieland regularly in attendance. Johanna’s success had a bearing on Arthur’s future, for she introduced him to Goethe, which eventually led to their collaboration on a theory of colors. At one of his mother’s gatherings, Schopenhauer also met the Orientalist scholar Friedrich Majer, who stimulated in Arthur a lifelong interest in Eastern thought. At the same time, Johanna and Arthur never got along well: she found him morose and overly critical and he regarded her as a superficial social climber. The tensions between them reached its peak when Arthur was 30 years old, at which time she requested that he never contact her again.

Before his break with his mother, Arthur matriculated to the University of Göttingen in 1809, where he enrolled in the study of medicine. In his third semester at Göttingen, Arthur decided to dedicate himself to the study of philosophy, for in his words: “Life is an unpleasant business… I have resolved to spend mine reflecting on it.” Schopenhauer studied philosophy under the tutelage of Gottlieb Ernst Schultz, whose major work was a critical commentary of Kant’s system of transcendental idealism. Schultz insisted that Schopenhauer begin his study of philosophy by reading the works of Immanuel Kant and Plato, the two thinkers who became the most influential philosophers in the development of his own mature thought. Schopenhauer also began a study of the works of Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph von Schelling, of whose thought he became deeply critical.

Schopenhauer transferred to Berlin University in 1811 for the purpose of attending the lectures of Johann Gottlieb Fichte, who at the time was considered the most exciting and important German philosopher of his day. Schopenhauer also attended Friedrich Schleiermacher’s lectures, for Schleiermacher was regarded as a highly competent translator and commentator of Plato. Schopenhauer became disillusioned with both thinkers, and with university intellectual life in general, which he regarded as unnecessarily abstruse, removed from genuine philosophical concerns, and compromised by theological agendas.

Napoleon’s Grande Armee arrived in Berlin in 1813, and soon after Schopenhauer moved to Rudolstat, a small town near Weimar, in order to escape the political turmoil. There Schopenhauer wrote his doctoral dissertation, The Fourfold Root of the Principle of Sufficient Reason, in which he provided a systematic investigation of the principle of sufficient reason. He regarded his project as a response to Kant who, in delineating the categories, neglected to attend to the forms that ground them. The following year Schopenhauer settled in Dresden, hoping that the quiet bucolic surroundings and rich intellectual resources found there would foster the development of his philosophical system. Schopenhauer also began an intense study of Baruch Spinoza, whose notion of natura naturans, a notion that characterized nature as self-activity, became key to the formulation of his account of the will in his mature system.

During his time in Dresden, he wrote On Vision and Colors, the product of his collaboration with Goethe. In this work, he used Goethe’s theory as a starting point in order to provide a theory superior to that of his mentor. Schopenhauer’s relationship with Goethe became strained after Goethe became aware of the publication. During his time in Dresden, Schopenhauer dedicated himself to completing his philosophical system, a system that combined Kant’s transcendental idealism with Schopenhauer’s original insight that the will is the thing-in-itself. He published his major work that expounded this system, The World as Will and Representation, in December of 1818 (with a publication date of 1819). To Schopenhauer’s chagrin, the book made no impression on the public.

In 1820, Schopenhauer was awarded permission to lecture at the University of Berlin. He deliberately, and impudently, scheduled his lectures during the same hour as those of G.W.F. Hegel, who was the most distinguished member of the faculty. Only a handful of students attended Schopenhauer’s lectures while over 200 students attended the lectures of Hegel. Although he remained on the list of lecturers for many years in Berlin, no one showed any further interest in attending his lectures, which only fueled his contempt for academic philosophy.

The following decade was perhaps Schopenhauer’s darkest and least productive. Not only did he suffer from the lack of recognition that his groundbreaking philosophy received, but he also suffered from a variety illnesses. He attempted to make a career as a translator from French and English prose, but these attempts also met with little interest from the outside world. During this time Schopenhauer also lost a lawsuit to the seamstress Caroline Luise Marguet that began in 1821 and was settled five years later. Marguet accused Schopenhauer of beating and kicking her when she refused to leave the antechamber to his apartment. As a result of the suit, Schopenhauer had to pay her 60 thalers annually for the rest of her life.

In 1831, Schopenhauer fled Berlin because of a cholera epidemic (an epidemic that later took the life of Hegel) and settled in Frankfurt am Main, where he remained for the rest of his life. In Frankfurt, he again became productive, publishing a number of works that expounded various points in his philosophical system. He published On the Will in Nature in 1836, which explained how new developments in the physical sciences served as confirmation of his theory of the will. In 1839, he received public recognition for the first time, a prize awarded by the Norwegian Academy, on his essay, On the Freedom of the Human Will. In 1840 he submitted an essay entitled On the Basis of Morality to the Danish Academy, but was awarded no prize even though his essay was the only submission. In 1841, he published both essays under the title, The Fundamental Problems of Morality, and included an introduction that was little more than a scathing indictment of Danish Academy for failing to recognize the value of his insights.

Schopenhauer was able to publish an enlarged second edition to his major work in 1843, which more than doubled the size of the original edition. The new expanded edition earned Schopenhauer no more acclaim than the original work. He published a work of popular philosophical essays and aphorisms aimed at the general public in 1851 under the title, Parerga and Paralipomena (Secondary Works and Belated Observations). This work, the most unlikely of his books, earned him his fame, and from the most unlikely of places: a review written by the English scholar John Oxenford, entitled “Iconoclasm in German Philosophy,” which was translated into German. The review excited an interest in German readers, and Schopenhauer became famous virtually overnight. Schopenhauer spent the rest of his life reveling in his hard won and belated fame, and died in 1860.

2. Schopenhauer’s Thought

Schopenhauer’s philosophy stands apart from other German idealist philosophers in many respects. Perhaps most surprising for the first time reader of Schopenhauer familiar with the writings of other German idealists would be the clarity and elegance of his prose. Schopenhauer was an avid reader of the great stylists in England and France, and he tried to emulate their style in his own writings. Schopenhauer often charged more abstruse writers such as Fichte and Hegel with deliberate obfuscation, describing the latter as a scribbler of nonsense in his second edition of The Fourfold Root of the Principle of Sufficient Reason.

Schopenhauer’s philosophy also stands in contrast with his contemporaries insofar as his system remains virtually unchanged from its first articulation in the first edition of The World as Will and Representation. Even his dissertation, which he wrote before he recognized the role of the will in metaphysics, was incorporated into his mature system. For this reason, his thought has been arranged thematically rather than chronologically below.

a. The World as Will and Representation

i. Schopenhauer’s Metaphysics and Epistemology

The starting point for Schopenhauer’s metaphysics is Immanuel Kant’s system of transcendental idealism as explained in The Critique of Pure Reason. Although Schopenhauer is quite critical of much of the content of Kant’s Transcendental Analytic, he endorses Kant’s approach to metaphysics in Kant’s limiting the sphere of metaphysics to articulating the conditions of experience rather than transcending the bounds of experience. In addition, he accepts the results of the Transcendental Aesthetic, which demonstrate the truth of transcendental idealism. Like Kant, Schopenhauer argues that the phenomenal world is a representation, i.e., an object for the subject conditioned by the forms of our cognition. At the same time, Schopenhauer simplifies the activity of the Kantian cognitive apparatus by holding that all cognitive activity occurs according to the principle of sufficient reason, that is, that nothing is without a reason for being.

In Schopenhauer’s dissertation, which was published under the title The Fourfold Root of Sufficient Reason, he argues that all of our representations are connected according to one of the four manifestations of the principle of sufficient reason, each of which concerns a different class of objects. The principle of sufficient reason of becoming, which regards empirical objects, provides an explanation in terms of causal necessity: any material state presupposes a prior state from which it regularly follows. The principle of sufficient reason of knowing, which regards concepts or judgments, provides an explanation in terms of logical necessity: if a judgment is to be true, it must have a sufficient ground. Regarding the third branch of the principle, that of space and time, the ground for being is mathematical: space and time are so constituted that all their parts mutually determine one another. Finally, for the principle regarding willing, we require as a ground a motive, which is an inner cause for that which it was done. Every action presupposes a motive from which it follows by necessity.

Schopenhauer argues that prior philosophers, including Kant, have failed to recognize that the first manifestation and second manifestations are distinct, and subsequently tend to conflate logical grounds and causes. Moreover, philosophers have not heretofore recognized the principle’s operation in the realms of mathematics and human action. Thus Schopenhauer was confident that his dissertation not only would provide an invaluable corrective to prior accounts of the principle of sufficient reason, but would also allow every brand of explanation to acquire greater certainty and precision.

It should be noted that while Schopenhauer’s account of the principle of sufficient reason owes much to Kant’s account of the faculties, his account is significantly at odds with Kant’s in several ways. For Kant, the understanding always operates by means of concepts and judgments, and the faculties of understanding and reason are distinctly human (at least regarding those animate creatures with which we are familiar). Schopenhauer, however, asserts that the understanding is not conceptual and is a faculty that both animals and humans possess. In addition, Schopenhauer’s account of the fourth root of the principle of sufficient reason is at odds with Kant’s account of human freedom, for Schopenhauer argues that actions follow necessarily from their motives.

Schopenhauer incorporates his account of the principle of sufficient reason into the metaphysical system of his chief work, The World as Will and Representation. As we have seen, Schopenhauer, like Kant, holds that representations are always constituted by the forms of our cognition. However, Schopenhauer points out that there is an inner nature to phenomena that eludes the principle of sufficient reason. For example, etiology (the science of physical causes) describes the manner in which causality operates according to the principle of sufficient reason, but it cannot explain the natural forces that underlie and determine physical causality. All such forces remain, to use Schopenhauer’s term, “occult qualities.”

At the same time, there is one aspect of the world that is not given to us merely as representation, and that is our own bodies. We are aware of our bodies as objects in space and time, as a representation among other representations, but we also experience our bodies in quite a different way, as the felt experiences of our own intentional bodily motions (that is, kinesthesis). This felt awareness is distinct from the body’s spatio-temporal representation. Since we have insight into what we ourselves are aside from representation, we can extend this insight to every other representation as well. Thus, Schopenhauer concludes, the innermost nature [Innerste], the underlying force, of every representation and also of the world as a whole is the will, and every representation is an objectification of the will. In short, the will is the thing in itself. Thus Schopenhauer can assert that he has completed Kant’s project because he has successfully identified the thing in itself.

Although every representation is an expression of will, Schopenhauer denies that every item in the world acts intentionally or has consciousness of its own movements. The will is a blind, unconscious force that is present in all of nature. Only in its highest objectifications, that is, only in animals, does this blind force become conscious of its own activity. Although the conscious purposive striving that the term ‘will’ implies is not a fundamental feature of the will, conscious purposive striving is the manner in which we experience it and Schopenhauer chooses the term with this fact in mind.

Hence, the title of Schopenhauer’s major work, The World as Will and Representation, aptly summarizes his metaphysical system. The world is the world of representation, as a spatio-temporal universal of individuated objects, a world constituted by our own cognitive apparatus. At the same time, the inner being of this world, what is outside of our cognitive apparatus or what Kant calls the thing-in-itself, is the will; the original force manifested in every representation.

ii. The Ideas and Schopenhauer’s Aesthetics

Schopenhauer argues that space and time, which are the principles of individuation, are foreign to the thing-in-itself, for they are the modes of our cognition. For us, the will expresses itself in a variety of individuated beings, but the will in itself is an undivided unity. It is the same force at work in our own willing, in the movements of animals, of plants and of inorganic bodies.

Yet, if the world is composed of undifferentiated willing, why does this force manifest itself in such a vast variety of ways? Schopenhauer’s reply is that the will is objectified in a hierarchy of beings. At its lowest grade, we see the will objectified in natural forces, and at its highest grade the will is objectified in the species of human being. The phenomena of higher grades of the will are produced by conflicts occurring between different phenomena of the lower grades of the will, and in the phenomenon of the higher Idea, the lower grades are subsumed. For instance, the laws of chemistry and gravity continue to operate in animals, although such lower grades cannot explain fully their movements. Although Schopenhauer explains the grades of the will in terms of development, he insists that the gradations did not develop over time, for such an understanding would assume that time exists independently of our cognitive faculties. Thus in all natural beings we see the will expressing itself in its various objectifications. Schopenhauer identifies these objectifications with the Platonic Ideas for a number of reasons. They are outside of space and time, related to individual beings as their prototypes, and ontologically prior to the individual beings that correspond to them.

Although the laws of nature presuppose the Ideas, we cannot intuit the Ideas simply by observing the activities of nature, and this is due to the relation of the will to our representations. The will is the thing in itself, but our experience of the will, our representations, are constituted by our form of cognition, the principle of sufficient reason. The principle of sufficient reason produces the world of representation as a nexus of spatio-temporal, causally related entities. Therefore, Schopenhauer’s metaphysical system seems to preclude our having access to the Ideas as they are in themselves, or in a way that transcends this spatio-temporal causally related framework.

However, Schopenhauer asserts that there is a kind of knowing that is free from the principle of sufficient reason. To have knowledge that is not conditioned by our forms of cognition would be an impossibility for Kant. Schopenhauer makes such knowledge possible by distinguishing the conditions of knowing, namely, the principle of sufficient reason, from the condition for objectivity in general. To be an object for a subject is a condition of objects that is more basic than the principle of sufficient reason for Schopenhauer. Since the principle of sufficient reason allows us to experience objects as particulars existing in space and time with a causal relation to other things, to have an experience of an object solely insofar as it presents itself to a subject, apart from the principle of sufficient reason, is to experience an object that is neither spatio-temporal nor in a causal relation to other objects. Such objects are the Ideas, and the kind of cognition involved in perceiving them is aesthetic contemplation, for perception of the Ideas is the experience of the beautiful.

Schopenhauer argues that the ability to transcend the everyday point of view and regard objects of nature aesthetically is not available to most human beings. Rather, the ability to regard nature aesthetically is the hallmark of the genius, and Schopenhauer describes the content of art through an examination of genius. The genius, claims Schopenhauer, is one who has been given by nature a superfluity of intellect over will. For Schopenhauer, the intellect is designed to serve the will. Since in living organisms, the will manifests itself as the drive for self-preservation, the intellect serves individual organisms by regulating their relations with the external world in order to secure their self-preservation. Because the intellect is designed to be entirely in service of the will, it slumbers, to use Schopenhauer’s colorful metaphor, unless the will awakens it and sets it in motion. Therefore ordinary knowledge always concerns the relations, laid down by the principle of sufficient reason, of objects in terms of the demands of the will.

Although the intellect exists only to serve the will, in certain humans the intellect accorded by nature is so disproportionately large, it far exceeds the amount needed to serve the will. In such individuals, the intellect can break free of the will and act independently. A person with such an intellect is a genius (only men can have such a capability according to Schopenhauer), and this will-free activity is aesthetic contemplation or creation. The genius is thus distinguished by his ability to engage in will-less contemplation of the Ideas for a sustained period of time, which allows him to repeat what he has apprehended by creating a work of art. In producing a work of art, the genius makes the beautiful accessible for the non-genius as well. Whereas non-geniuses cannot intuit the Ideas in nature, they can intuit them in a work of art, for the artist replicates nature in the artwork in such a manner that the viewer is capable of viewing it disinterestedly, that is, freed from her own willing, as an Idea.

Schopenhauer states that aesthetic contemplation is characterized by objectivity. The intellect in its normal functioning is in the service of the will. As such, our normal perception is always tainted by our subjective strivings. The aesthetic point of view, since it is freed from such strivings, is more objective than any other ways of regarding an object. Art does not transport the viewer to an imaginary or even ideal realm. Rather it affords the opportunity to view life without the distorting influence of his own will.

b. The Human Will: Agency, Freedom, and Ethical Action

i. Agency and Freedom

Any account of human agency in Schopenhauer must be given in terms of his account of the will. For Schopenhauer, all acts of will are bodily movements, and thus are not the internal cause of bodily movements. What distinguishes an act of will from other events, which are also expressions of the will, is that it meets two criteria: it is a bodily movement caused by a motive, and it is accompanied by a direct awareness of this movement. Schopenhauer provides both a psychological and physiological account of motives. In his psychological account, motives are causes that occur in the medium of cognition, or internal causes. Motives are mental events that arise in response to an awareness of some motivating object. Schopenhauer argues that these mental events can never be desires or emotions: desires and emotions are expressions of the will and thus are not included under the class of representations. Rather, a motive is the awareness of some object of representation. These representations can be abstract; thinking the concept of an object, or intuitive; perceiving an object. Thus Schopenhauer provides a causal picture of action, and it is one in which mental events cause physical events.

In Schopenhauer’s physiological account of motives, motives are brain processes that cause certain neural activities and these translate into bodily motion. The psychological and physical accounts are consistent insofar as Schopenhauer has a dual-aspect view of the mental and physical. The mental and the physical are not two causally linked realms, but two aspects of the same nature, where one cannot be reduced to or explained by the other. It is important to underscore the fact that in the physiological account, the will is not a function of the brain. Rather it is present as irritability in the muscular fibers of the whole body.

According to Schopenhauer, the will, as muscular irritability, is a continual striving for activity in general. Because this striving has no direction, it aims at all directions at once and thus produces no physical movement. However, when the nervous system provides the direction for this movement (that is, when motives act on the will), the movement is given direction and bodily movement occurs. The nerves do not move the muscles, rather they provide the occasion for the muscles’ movements.

The causal mechanism in acts of will is necessary and lawful, as are all causal relations in Schopenhauer’s view. Acts of will follow from motives with the same necessity that the motion of a billiard ball follows from its being struck. Yet this account leads to a problem concerning the unpredictability of acts: if the causal process is law governed, and if acts of will are causally determined, Schopenhauer must account for the fact that human actions are unpredictable. This unpredictability of human action, he argues, is due to the impossibility of knowing comprehensively the character of an individual. Each character is unique, and thus it is impossible to predict fully how a motive or set of motives will effect bodily motion. In addition, we usually do not know what a person’s beliefs are concerning the motive, and these beliefs influence how she will respond to it. However, if we had a full account of a person’s character as well as her beliefs, we could with scientific accuracy predict what bodily motion would result from a particular motive.

Schopenhauer distinguishes between causation that occurs through stimuli, which is mechanistic, and that which occurs through motives. Each kind of causality occurs with necessity and lawfulness. The difference between these different classifications of causes regards the commensurability and proximity of cause and the effect, not their degree of lawfulness. In mechanical causation, the cause is contiguous and commensurate to the effect, both cause and effect are easily perceived, and therefore their causal lawfulness is clear. For instance, a billiard ball must be struck in order to move, and the force in which one ball hits will be equal to the force in which the other ball moves. In stimuli, causes are proximate: there is no separation between receiving the impression and being determined by it. At the same time, cause and effect are not always commensurate: for instance, when a plant reaches up to the sun, the sun as cause makes no motion to produce the effect of the plant’s movement. In motive causality, the cause is neither proximate nor commensurate: the memory of Helen can cause whole armies to run to battle, for instance. Consequently the lawfulness in motive causality is difficult, if not impossible, to perceive.

Because human action is causally determined, Schopenhauer denies that humans can freely choose how they respond to motives. In any course of events, one and only one course of action is available to the agent, and the agent performs that action with necessity. Schopenhauer must, then, account for the fact that agents experience their own actions as contingent. Moreover, he must account for the active nature of agency, the fact that agents experience their actions as things they do and not things that happen to them.

Schopenhauer gives an explanation of the active nature of agency, but not in terms of the causal efficacy of agents. Instead, the key to accounting for human agency lies in the distinction between one’s intelligible and empirical character. Our intelligible character is our character outside of space and time, and is the original force of the will. We cannot have access to our intelligible character, as it exists outside our forms of knowing. Like all forces in nature, it is original, inalterable and inexplicable. Our empirical character is our character insofar as it manifests itself in individual acts of will: it is, in short, the phenomenon of the intelligible character. The empirical character is an object of experience and thus tied to the forms of experience, namely space, time and causality.

However, the intelligible character is not determined by these forms, and thus is free. Schopenhauer calls this freedom transcendental, as it is outside the realm of experience. Although we can have no experience of our intelligible character, we do have some awareness of the fact that our actions issue from it and thus are very much our own. This awareness accounts for our experiencing our deeds as both original and spontaneous. Thus our deeds are both events linked with other events in a lawfully determined causal chain and acts that issue directly from our own characters. Our actions can embody both these otherwise contradictory characterizations because these characterizations refer to the deeds from two different aspects of our characters, the empirical and the intelligible.

Our characters also explain why we attribute moral responsibility to agents even though acts are causally necessitated. Characters determine the consequences that motives effect on our bodies. Yet, states Schopenhauer, our characters are entirely our own: our characters are fundamentally what we are. This is why we assign praise or blame not to acts but to the agents who commit them. And this is why we hold ourselves responsible: not because we could have acted differently given who we are, but that we could have been different from who we are. Although there is not freedom in our action, there is freedom in our essence, our intelligible character, insofar as our essence lies outside the forms of our cognition, that is to say, space, time and causality.

ii. Ethics

Like Kant, Schopenhauer reconciles freedom and necessity in human action through the distinction between the phenomenal and noumenal realms. However, he was sharply critical of Kant’s deontological framework. Schopenhauer charged Kant with committing a petitio principii, for he assumed at the outset of his ethics that purely moral laws and then constructed an ethics to account for such laws. Schopenhauer argues, however, that Kant provides no proof for the existence of such laws. Indeed, Schopenhauer avers that no such laws, which have their basis in theological assumptions, exist. Likewise, Schopenhauer attacks Kant’s account of morality as characterized by an unconditioned ought. The notion of ‘ought’ only carries motivational force when accompanied by the threat of sanctions. Because no ought can be unconditioned insofar as its motivational force stems from its implicit threat of punishment, all imperatives are in fact, according to Schopenhauer, hypothetical.

Nor does Schopenhauer accept Kant’s claim that morality derives from reason: like David Hume, Schopenhauer regards reason as instrumental. The origins of morality are not found in reason, but rather in the feeling of compassion that allows one to transcend the standpoint of egoism. The dictum of morality is “Harm no one and help others as much as you can.” Most persons operate exclusively from egoistic motives, for, as Schopenhauer explains, our knowledge of our own weal and woe is direct, while our knowledge of the weal and woe of others is always only representation and thus does not affect us.

Although most persons are motivated primarily by egoistic concerns, certain rare persons can act from compassion, and it is compassion that forms the basis of Schopenhauer’s ethics. Compassion is prompted by the awareness of the suffering of another person, and Schopenhauer characterizes it as a kind of felt knowledge. Compassion is born of the awareness that individuation is merely phenomenal. Consequently the ethical point of view expresses a deeper knowledge than what is found in the ordinary manner of viewing the world. Indeed, the feeling of compassion is nothing other than the felt knowledge that the suffering of another has a reality equal to one’s own suffering insofar as the world in itself is an undifferentiated unity. Schopenhauer asserts that this knowledge cannot be taught or even communicated, but can only be brought about by experience.

Since compassion is the basis of Schopenhauer’s ethics, the ethical significance of conduct is found in the motive alone, an aspect of his ethics that finds affinity with Kant. Thus Schopenhauer distinguishes the just person from the good person not by the nature of their actions, but by their level of compassion: the just person sees through the principle of individuation enough to avoid causing harm to another, whereas the good person sees through it even further, to the point that the suffering he sees in others touches him almost as closely as does his own. Such a person not only avoids harming others, but actively tries to alleviate the suffering of others. At its highest point, someone may recognize the suffering of others with such clarity that he is willing to sacrifice his own well-being for the sake of others, if by doing so the suffering he will alleviate outweighs the suffering he must endure. This, says Schopenhauer, is the highest point in ethical conduct.

3. Schopenhauer’s Pessimism

Schopenhauer’s pessimism is the most well known feature of his philosophy, and he is often referred to as the philosopher of pessimism. Schopenhauer’s pessimistic vision follows from his account of the inner nature of the world as aimless blind striving.

Because the will has no goal or purpose, the will’s satisfaction is impossible. The will objectifies itself in a hierarchy of gradations from inorganic to organic life, and every grade of objectification of the will, from gravity to animal motion, is marked by insatiable striving. In addition, every force of nature and every organic form of nature participates in a struggle to seize matter from other forces or organisms. Thus existence is marked by conflict, struggle and dissatisfaction.

The attainment of a goal or desire, Schopenhauer continues, results in satisfaction, whereas the frustration of such attainment results in suffering. Since existence is marked by want or deficiency, and since satisfaction of this want is unsustainable, existence is characterized by suffering. This conclusion holds for all of nature, including inanimate natures, insofar as they are at essence will. However, suffering is more conspicuous in the life of human beings because of their intellectual capacities. Rather than serving as a relief from suffering, the intellect of human beings brings home their suffering with greater clarity and consciousness. Even with the use of reason, human beings can in no way alter the degree of misery we experience; indeed, reason only magnifies the degree to which we suffer. Thus all the ordinary pursuits of mankind are not only fruitless but also illusory insofar as they are oriented toward satisfying an insatiable, blind will.

Since the essence of existence is insatiable striving, and insatiable striving is suffering, Schopenhauer concludes that nonexistence is preferable to existence. However, suicide is not the answer. One cannot resolve the problem of existence through suicide, for since all existence is suffering, death does not end one’s suffering but only terminates the form that one’s suffering takes. The proper response to recognizing that all existence is suffering is to turn away from or renounce one’s own desiring. In this respect, Schopenhauer’s thought finds confirmation in the Eastern texts he read and admired: the goal of human life is to turn away from desire. Salvation can only be found in resignation.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources Available in English

Manuscript Remains in Four Volumes. Edited by Arthur Hübscher, Translated by E.F.J. Payne. Oxford: Berg Publishers, 1988.
On the Fourfold Root of the Principle of Sufficient Reason. Translated by E.F.J. Payne. LaSalle: Open Court Press, 1997.
On the Basis of Morality. Translated by E.F.J. Payne. Indianapolis: The Bobbs Merrill Company, 1965.
On the Will in Nature. Translated by E.F.J. Payne, Edited by David Cartwright. New York: Berg Publishers, 1992.
Parerga and Paralipomena Volumes 1 and II. Translated by E.F.J. Payne. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Prize Essay on the Freedom of the Will. Edited by Gunther Zoller, Translated by E.F. J. Payne. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
The World as Will and Representation. Translated by E.F.J. Payne, 2 vols. New York: Dover, 1969.

b. Secondary Sources

Atwell, John E. Schopenhauer: The Human Character . Philadelphia: Temple University Press, 1990.
- Provides a lucid account of Schopenhauer’s ethics and pessimism.
Atwell, John E. Schopenhauer on the Character of the World: The Metaphysics of Will. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1995.
- An excellent and comprehensive account of Schopenhauer’s metaphysics and epistemology that brings new insight into Schopenhauer’s methodology.
Cartwright, David E. Schopenhauer: A Biography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
- The most comprehensive biography of Schopenhauer available in English.
Copleston, Frederick. Arthur Schopenhauer, Philosopher of Pessimism. London: Barnes and Noble, 1975.
- The first book length monograph on Schopenhauer written in English.
Hamlyn, D.W. Schopenhauer. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1980.
- A brief but substantive critical analysis of his thought that includes a strong summary of his dissertation as well as his relationship to Kant.
Hübscher, Arthur, The Philosophy of Schopenhauer in Its Intellectual Context: Thinker Against the Tide. Translated by Joachim T. Baer and David E. Cartwright. Lewiston, N.Y : Edwin Mellon Press, 1989.
- An excellent intellectual biography, extensively covers his earliest (pre-dissertation) thought and the influences of German romanticism and idealism.
Jacquette, Dale, ed. Schopenhauer, Philosophy, and the Arts. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
- A collection of essays on both Schopenhauer’s aesthetics and the influence his aesthetics had on later artists.
Janaway, Christopher, ed. Willing and Nothingness: Schopenhauer as Nietzsche’s Educator. Oxford; Clarendon Press, 1998.
- These essays explore Schopenhauer’s influence on Nietzsche. The book includes a complete list of textual references to Schopenhauer in Nietzsche’s writings.
Magee, Bryan. The Philosophy of Schopenhauer. Oxford: Carendon Press, 1983.
- Covers the whole of Schopenhauer’s thought, as well as an extensive account on his influence on later thinkers and artists such as Wagner and Wittgenstein.
Safranski, Ruediger, Schopenhauer and the Wild Years of Philosophy. Translated by Ewald Osers, London: Weidenfeld and Nicolson, 1989.
- An entertaining biography that provides insight into the political and cultural milieu in which Schopenhauer developed his thought.
Young, Julian, Willing and Unwilling: A Study in the Philosophy of Arthur Schopenhauer. Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff, 1987.
- An influential reading of Schopenhauer’s work, which argues that Schopenhauer’s account of the thing-in-itself cannot be wholly identified with the will.

Author Information

Mary Troxell
Email: mary.troxell.1@bc.edu
Boston College
U. S. A.

Epistemic Entitlement

In the early 1990s there emerged a growing interest with the concept of epistemic entitlement. Philosophers who acknowledge the existence of entitlements maintain that there are beliefs or judgments unsupported by evidence available to the subject, but which the subject nonetheless has the epistemic right to hold. Some of these may include beliefs non-inferentially sourced in perception, memory, introspection, testimony, and the a priori. Unlike the traditional notion of justification, entitlement is often characterized as an externalist type of epistemic warrant, in the sense that a subject’s being entitled is determined by facts and circumstances that are independent of any reasoning capacities she may or may not have, and which the subject herself need not understand or be able to recognize. One key motivation for this view is that the inclusion of entitlement in epistemology can account for the commonly held intuition that largely unreflective individuals, such as children and non-human animals, possess warrant and basic knowledge about the world. It also paves the way for a tenable foundationalist epistemology, according to which there exist warranted beliefs which are not themselves warranted or justified by any further beliefs. This article explores theories of entitlement as presented by four prominent philosophers: Fred Dretske, Tyler Burge, Crispin Wright, and Christopher Peacocke.

Dretske on Entitlement
Burge on Entitlement
Wright on Entitlement
Peacocke on Entitlement
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Dretske on Entitlement

Fred Dretske has argued for the existence of epistemic entitlements. Like justification, entitlement is an epistemic property of belief which, when the belief is true (and the subject is not in a Gettier-style situation), constitutes knowledge. Much of Dretske’s work on this topic rises out of his (2000) article: “Entitlements: Epistemic Rights without Epistemic Duties?” Part of understanding his view involves having a grasp of the question being posed in the article’s title. Unlike justifications, entitlements are epistemic rights we have to believe various propositions without having any added requirements to engage, or be able to engage, in some sophisticated mental exercise. Considering what is included in the conception of justification, the traditional answer suggests that being justified is a matter of fulfilling various epistemic duties or obligations. Some of these duties may include: gathering ample evidence, arriving at beliefs carefully and methodically, deliberating over the strength of one’s supportive reasons, and so forth. For instance, if it is true that Detective Johnson is justified in believing

GUILTY: Smith is guilty of the murder,

then it must be that she has good reasons for thinking GUILTY true, reasons of which she herself is aware and could appeal to if she needed to defend her belief. Johnson’s reasons may be, for example, that Smith’s fingerprints were on the murder weapon and Smith had strong motive to kill. Though these sorts of epistemic requirements obtain for beliefs like GUILTY (as we shall assume), Dretske thinks there are other sorts of beliefs you and I have which: (1) amount to genuine knowledge, but that also (2) are not justified in the sense just described. Consider your perceptual belief that

BRIGHT: There is a bright screen ahead of me,

or a memorial belief that

ATE: I ate breakfast this morning.

Given that you know these propositions, it seems too strong a condition that you must recognize that which provides the epistemic support for these beliefs, or be in a position to defend them by way of some argument. Additionally, many philosophers think that children and lower animals have perceptual and memorial knowledge, yet they lack the conceptual skills needed to be able to think about what it is that gives them this knowledge. The point is that the conditions for acquiring a justification for a belief like GUILTY are harder to satisfy than they are for acquiring an entitlement for a belief like BRIGHT. Thus, Dretske holds that there exists a kind of epistemic good that attaches to our various perceptual beliefs and memorial beliefs (and perhaps others) but which is distinct from the traditional notion of justification. This epistemic good is what he calls entitlement. To have an entitlement is to have the epistemic right to believe a proposition in which the possessor need not be consciously reflective of that which awards the entitlement. (Notice that the relevant kinds of beliefs Dretske has in mind, like BRIGHT or ATE, are about things in the outer world, not our own conscious experiences or memories.)

In this way epistemic entitlements are analogous to various legal or constitutional rights we have. There is no added physical effort or labor you had to exert to be awarded the right to vote in the U.S. presidential election; you have this right solely in virtue of having the status of being a U.S. citizen and at least eighteen years old. Indeed, you have this right whether or not you know that you do. The same goes for one’s right to the property bequeathed by a passing family member. The recipient did not have to do anything to “earn” her entitlement to that property; that she is simply listed in the will suffices. Similarly, what gives people the epistemic right, or entitlement, to hold various beliefs is determined by circumstances independent of any reasoning capacities they may or may not have. A subject may have an entitlement to her belief even if she is unaware that she has it.

Before proceeding, note that Dretske is operating with a narrow characterization of justification. He thinks that justification is an epistemically internalist notion in the sense that to be justified in holding a belief, there must be some proposition (or propositions) one already believes and which one has reflective access to and could be used to justify that belief. On the other hand, entitlement receives an externalist characterization in the sense that one can have an entitlement without having access to that which makes one entitled. It is worth mentioning, however, that not all epistemologists understand justification in the way Dretske does. Whereas for Dretske, the things that do the justifying are other beliefs one has, some internalists allow other sorts of mental states, like perceptual experiences and memories, to count as reasons or justifications (Audi 1993 and Pryor 2000). Also, some philosophers prefer to use ‘internalism’ simply as the claim that the things that justify a belief are internal to one’s mental life. One could be an internalist about justification in this weaker sense, which is commonly referred to as mentalism (see Conee and Feldman 2003), without requiring that one be able to access or become aware of one’s justifying mental states or to believe that these states are reliable. Thus, according to a mentalist, a child may be justified in believing BRIGHT, provided that it is properly grounded in her experience of a bright screen ahead, even if the child does not herself recognize her experience as that which makes her justified. The point is that Dretskean entitlement, if it is a distinctive epistemic concept, differs from justification only as understood in Dretske’s restricted sense of the term as that of being backed by other beliefs to which one could appeal in support of one’s belief.

The main question Dretske wishes to answer is: if there are things we are entitled to accept as true, what grounds this entitlement? In other words, what entitles us to believe various propositions? It is important to emphasize that these are questions posed specifically to philosophers; entitled subjects themselves need not know, and quite often do not know, the answer to them. Dretske begins his answer by distancing his view of entitlement from a pure reliabilist view that one has the epistemic right to the belief that p if and only if the belief that p was produced by a reliable process. For a pure reliabilist, given that your perceptual system produced your belief that BRIGHT, and assuming that perception yields true beliefs on most occasions, you are epistemically permitted to hold this belief. But according to Dretske, there are (at least) two reasons why entitlement must not be associated with this form of reliabilism. First, one can surely hold what is in fact a reliably-produced belief while at the same time having independent reasons for doubting its truth (for example, you have evidence that you’ve taken a mind-altering drug, yet you continue to trust your senses as they indicate a three-foot bumble bee). To maintain the belief in such a situation would, intuitively, be irrational on the subject’s part, which, it seems, would thereby strip the subject of her epistemic right to that belief. However, by concentrating entirely on the reliability of a belief-forming process, a pure reliabilist cannot accommodate this intuition. Entitlement must therefore be understood as a defeasible epistemic right, one that can be defeated by countervailing evidence. Secondly, Dretske holds that entitlements supervene on the subjective resources of the subject. This implies that two subjects with identical psychological make-ups cannot differ with respect to the entitlements they possess (For this reason, it is plausible that Dretskean entitlement has an element of internalism, but only of the weaker, mentalist sort described above). For example, suppose there is some being who has the exact same experiences, beliefs, methods of reasoning, and so forth, as you do. Suppose further that this “mental twin” of yours is, unbeknownst to her, nothing but a bodiless brain in a vat whose experiences are systematically being fed by a powerful supercomputer. While your perceptual system is highly reliable (as we shall assume), your twin’s system is massively unreliable, because all of her experiences and corresponding beliefs are erroneous. According to a pure reliabilist, then, whereas you have the epistemic right to believe BRIGHT when you have an experience of a bright screen before you, your envatted twin lacks the right to BRIGHT when she has the exact same experience. Dretske, however, thinks that this is the wrong result. (The sort of case described here is commonly referred to as the New Evil Demon Problem, first introduced by Lehrer & Cohen 1983.) He thinks it is intuitively correct that your twin has the right to believe whatever you have a right to believe, even if your beliefs are true and her’s false. You have knowledge and your twin lacks it because knowledge requires truth and your twin’s beliefs are false; however, it seems that the unfortunate twin still retains some epistemic good. The correct account of entitlement should allow for this intuition and therefore be suited to award entitlements to subjects who are in unfavorable, illusory environments. (Although the New Evil Demon Problem does pose a challenge to the pure version of reliabilism Dretske considers, it bears mentioning that several philosophers have advanced other versions of reliabilism which purport to avoid this problem. See, for instance, Bach 1985, Goldman 1988, Comesaña 2002, Majors and Sawyer 2005.)

If the concept of entitlement is not grounded in the reliability of a belief-forming process, what is it grounded in? Dretske argues that we have entitlements to beliefs which are psychologically immediate and irresistible to us. There are certain sorts of beliefs over which we have no choice whether we hold them or not. Perceptual beliefs are a prime example. As you gaze your eyes on a computer screen, your visual experience of a bright screen causes you to believe BRIGHT. The causal sequence between experience and belief is simply out of your control, and it occurs much too quickly to avoid it. This fact about our psychologies, that we cannot resist some of our beliefs, is what accounts for our entitlements. As Dretske says, “We have a right to accept what we are powerless to reject” (2000, p. 598). In saying this, Dretske appeals to the well-known principle that ‘Ought implies Can’. Given that you are unable to refrain from believing BRIGHT, it would be unreasonable to suppose that you epistemically ought not to believe it. If this is correct, then we can see how your brain-in-a-vat twin is entitled to believe BRIGHT. Although her experience of the screen is inaccurate, and her perceptual system is unreliable, she enjoys an entitlement to her belief because she is equally as compelled to form the belief as you are.

Entitlements are defeated when the formation of a belief is avoidable, that is, when there are things the subject could have done, or more precisely, should have done that would have prevented her from being caused to believe. Suppose, for example, that you have independent evidence from a credible source that you are now looking at a well-crafted poster of a computer screen instead of a real one. Suppose further that you disregard this evidence, so that when you have the experience of a bright screen you are caused to believe BRIGHT. In this sort of case you lack an entitlement to this belief, because had you been properly responsive to the evidence in your possession, your experience would have failed to cause you to believe BRIGHT. One might interject here that this suggestion runs contrary to Dretske’s original proposal, because even though you have ignored the countervailing evidence, you still cannot avoid being compelled to believe BRIGHT when you had the experience. In response, Dretske maintains that entitlements should be reserved only for those beliefs that an epistemically responsible agent could not avoid being caused to form in similar circumstances. Because of this, given that you have this evidence, you epistemically ought to refrain from believing BRIGHT. Analogously, when a drunk driver accidentally runs over a child in the street, it may be that the driver is, at that time, in a situation where hitting the child was unavoidable. We do not say, though, that the driver therefore had the right to run over the child. The reason the driver is culpable for the accident is that were she more responsible, she would have taken measures to ensure that she did not get into the situation in the first place (for example, by taking a taxi home rather than driving). Similarly, even if you cannot avoid being caused by your experience to believe BRIGHT, your entitlement to that belief is stripped because a responsible agent in that same circumstance, recognizing that she has evidence that she is looking at a computer-screen poster, would have avoided being so caused.

We will now consider two objections to Dretske’s view. First, Michael Williams (2000) rejects Dretske’s contention that epistemic rights can exist in the complete absence of any epistemic duties. Given that Dretske takes entitlements to be defeasible rights, it is plausible that were one’s belief challenged by another person, that would cancel the entitlement one had to that belief. The only way to re-establish the entitlement, it seems, would be by providing reasons that defeat the challenge. If this is right, it suggests that Dretske overstates his position that entitlements are completely free of justificational obligations. While it may be correct that we need not actively provide positive evidential backing for every belief to which we are entitled, having an entitlement requires that one at least be able to justify or defend one’s belief in situations when one is presented with an appropriate challenge. As Williams notes, defeasibility and justificational commitments go together. The result, presumably, is that most young children and unreflective adults would lack entitlements to many of their perceptual and memorial beliefs, for they may lack the cognitive resources needed to be able to defend their own beliefs. However, this is a result some philosophers are willing to accept.

As for the second objection, many philosophers think that insofar as entitlements are epistemic goods that contribute to knowledge, they must be suitably connected to truth; they must be truth-conducive, or have a sufficiently high likelihood of being true. But this suggestion appears to be at odds with Dretske’s claim that your brain-in-a-vat mental twin, whose beliefs are almost all false, is entitled to the same beliefs that you are. One way epistemologists sometimes react to the New Evil Demon Problem is to draw a distinction between two kinds of epistemic standings: being epistemically blameless for holding a belief, on the one hand, and being fully entitled (or justified or warranted) in holding a belief, such that having this property makes an essential contribution to knowledge, on the other (see Pryor 2001). According to this distinction, whereas you are entitled to the belief (and also know) that BRIGHT, your envatted twin is merely blameless when she forms the same belief. It is through no fault of her own that she arrives at a false, unreliably-produced belief; nonetheless, she lacks an epistemic right which you possess. She is simply unlucky that her experiences and beliefs are not connected to the external world in the proper way.

In response to this charge, one could claim that the envatted subject’s beliefs are conducive to truth, but only relative to more favorable environments (see Goldman 1986 and Henderson & Horgan 2006). Given that the brain in a vat is a responsible agent, her beliefs would be mostly true if she were in an environment similar to the actual one. Alternatively, one could deny that a distinction between being blameless and being entitled (or justified or warranted) exists at all. The suggestion would be that to be justly entitled is for you (or an epistemically responsible agent) to be blameless in holding the belief (for defenders of this move see Ginet 1975, Chisholm 1977, and Bonjour 1985; for objections see Alston 1989a). Whether either of these options have promise, however, is something that Dretske would need to argue for.

2. Burge on Entitlement

Tyler Burge has argued that “[w]e are entitled to rely, other things equal, on perception, memory, deductive and inductive reasoning, and on…the word of others” (1993, p. 458). Because his work on perceptual entitlement is arguably the most developed, we shall focus our attention on perceptual beliefs: beliefs non-inferentially based on a perceptual experience.

Burge begins by introducing the concept of warrant, which he says is the most fundamental type of epistemic good. What makes it specifically an epistemic good is that a belief’s being warranted depends first and foremost on its being a good route to truth. Yet, it also depends on the subject’s own limitations: what information the subject has; what information is available; and how well that information is used. Thus, when he says warrant must be a good route to truth, he does not mean that warranted beliefs necessarily are true; one can be warranted in a belief which happens to be false. Nonetheless, the warranted subject must, at a minimum, be well-positioned to achieve truth. Being warranted entails being reliable, that is, the productive warranted belief has a sufficiently high likelihood of being true (at least under normal circumstances).

Warrant is divided into two sub-species. The first is justification. Justification is epistemically internalist in the sense that it is warrant by reason that is conceptually accessible upon reflection to the subject. Beliefs we are justified in holding are those that result from having engaged in reasoning or from having drawn an inference from other beliefs (Consider again the example from the previous section in which Johnson infers that Smith is guilty on the basis of her reasons that Smith’s fingerprints were on the murder weapon and he had motive to kill). But when we turn to the epistemology of perceptual belief, Burge thinks the transition from a perceptual state (for example, seeing a round and red apple on the table) to a belief (for example, APPLE: There is round and red apple there) is nothing at all like drawing an inference. In most typical situations, we do not reason our way from experience to belief; hence the warrant for our perceptual beliefs must not come in the form of justification. There are two primary reasons why Burge thinks this is so. First, reasoning is a sophisticated, intellectual mental exercise. The capacities necessary for reasoning are too complex for us to plausibly attribute them to certain groups of individuals, like children and higher non-human animals. If justification were the only form of warrant that there is, these individuals’ perceptual beliefs would lack warrant; yet it is commonly thought that these individuals are no less warranted in their perceptual beliefs than mature adults are. The second reason why it’s wrong to think we reason from experience to belief is that reasoning essentially involves progressing from one or more propositional attitudes one has, like a belief, to another as one would draw a conclusion from the premises of an argument. But Burge argues that perceptual states are not propositional attitudes. In other words, perception has nonpropositional content (see also Evans 1982, Peacock 2001, Heck 2007). Whereas a belief’s content (or what that belief concerns or is about) has predicational (or sentence-like) structure, perceptual content does not. The content of a perceptual state is more akin to a topographical map rather than a sentence. (For more on nonpropositional perceptual content, see Peacocke 1992.) Therefore, unlike beliefs, experiences are not the kinds of mental states from which one can draw inferences. Nonetheless, what is common among beliefs and perceptual states, and unlike other kinds of mental states like wishes and imaginings, is that they are both capable of being veridical: they have accuracy conditions that can be either satisfied or unsatisfied.

Given that perceptual beliefs are not justified in the sense just described, the type of warrant they receive must come under a different form. This brings us to the second sub-species of warrant: entitlement. Burgean entitlement is epistemically externalist in the sense that it is warrant that need not be fully conceptually accessible to the subject. Like Dretskean entitlement, one can have a Burgean entitlement to a perceptual belief, such as APPLE, without knowing or justifiably believing that one does. Also similar to Dretske’s view is the claim that entitlement is a defeasible kind of epistemic good: it can be defeated by independent reasons one may have for doubting that one’s perceptual faculties are properly functioning or that the believed proposition in question is true. Thus, absent reasons for doubt, one has an entitlement to conceptualize one’s perceptual experience in the form of a belief (for example, to believe APPLE when one has an experience of a round, red apple).

As one clarification, Burge’s claim is not that entitlement is the only kind of warrant that can attach to perceptual beliefs. People certainly can, and do, reason and deliberate about these sorts of beliefs. One can think, for example: “There appears to be a round and red apple, and when things appear this way they generally turn out to be accurate. Therefore, there is a round and red apple there.” This is a perfectly permissible way to reason, and doing so can result in acquiring a justification in addition to the perceptual entitlement one already possesses. The crucial point is that securing a warrant for this belief does not require that one reasons, or be able to reason, in this way. To impose such a requirement on all forms of warrant would result, as Burge says, in hyper-intellectualizing perceptual belief.

The key question Burge wants to answer is: What is the contribution of perceptual states per se to entitlements to perceptual beliefs? He thinks that two conditions must be met in order for a perceptual state to award the subject the epistemic right to believe as that state represents the world as being. To understand what these conditions are, it is important first to appreciate Burge’s claim that the perceptual system has a characteristic function. Some philosophers have argued that the function of any natural system can only be understood in terms of how it contributes to meeting the basic biological needs of the organism (see Millikan 1984). For example, on this view the perceptual system functions well only insofar as it enables the perceiver to identify mates, avoid predators, find food, and so on. Burge, however, distances himself from this sort of explanation. He holds instead that it is known on a priori grounds that the perceptual system is a representational system that has the function to represent the subject’s environment veridically and reliably (2003, p. 508). Although he agrees that reliable perception can, and oftentimes does, contribute to satisfying one’s biological needs (for example, being able to perceptually discriminate different colors can help one spot red berries to eat in a green forest), it is a mistake for philosophers to attempt to reduce the perceptual system’s function or explain it solely in terms of biological fitness. The sense in which the perceptual system “has done a good job” in a given situation should be evaluated in terms of its capacity for producing veridical perceptual states.

Provided that this is the perceptual system’s function, there is the further question of how the system is capable of producing states that accurately represent the environment. Burge’s answer centers on the thesis of perceptual anti-individualism (sometimes called perceptual content externalism). According to this thesis, the nature of a perceptual state (what that state represents) is partially determined by a history of causal interactions that have occurred between objects and properties in the environment, on the one hand, and the perceiver, or the perceiver’s evolutionary ancestors, on the other (see Burge 2003; 2005, Section I; 2007, Introduction; 2007a). What explains the fact that you are capable of (accurately or inaccurately) perceptually representing, say, shapes like roundness and colors like redness in the environment is that you, within your own lifetime, or your ancestors throughout the evolution of the species, regularly came into contact with various features in the environment, such as instances of these very shapes and colors. According to the view, these causal interactions help to establish the principles that govern the formation of the perceptual system’s states and inform the perceptual system of what it ought to represent when it is presented, in a given situation, with some array of stimuli (for example, light waves impacting the retina in the eyes or sound waves impacting the ear drums).

Thus one of the conditions that must be met for a perceptual state to confer an entitlement to a corresponding perceptual belief is that the state is anti-individualistically individuated. The other condition is as follows: one has an entitlement to believe as one’s perceptual state represents the environment as being, only if that type of perceptual state is reliably veridical in the subject’s normal environment. Burge defines the normal environment as the one in which the contents of the subject’s perceptual states are established. What this means is that for those perceptual states that do deliver entitlements, the existence of those types of perceptual states (for example, a state indicating roundness or redness) is explained by a history of causal interactions that were highly successful. That is, one has the general ability to perceptually represent property F because the perceptual system, in its evolutionary development, regularly confronted instances of F-ness in the environment. Thus, the normal environment might be where one currently lives, but it need not be. It is possible that the environment a subject currently lives in is different from the one in which her perceptual system evolved, where she, or her ancestors, first acquired the abilities to represent various objects and properties.

The reason why this second condition is important is that entitlement, insofar as it is a type of epistemic warrant, must be a good route to truth. Provided that perceptual states are established by high degrees of successful interactions with features in the environment, and hence are reliably veridical in the normal environment, “[v]eridicality enters into the very nature of perceptual states and abilities.” (Burge 2003, p. 532) To rely on a particular perceptual state the general type of which was established in this fashion in the formation of a belief makes it likely that that belief is true in the normal environment.

Burge goes on to argue that when these two conditions are met (that is, the perceptual state is anti-individualistically individuated and it is reliably veridical in the normal environment) one has a defeasible entitlement to rely on that state in any environment. This further point provides a novel solution to the New Evil Demon Problem, which was discussed in the previous section. Recall that this problem draws on a commonly held intuition that subjects in skeptical situations can hold warranted beliefs. Suppose you are a regular embodied person, and an apple on the table causes you to have a perceptual experience of a round and red apple, which subsequently causes you to believe APPLE. At the very next instant you are unknowingly transported to a different world where your brain is placed in a vat, and a computer produces the same experiences you were just having in your regular embodied state. You have the exact same experience of a round and red apple, except that now the experience is inaccurate (there are no apples nearby, just other brains and computer equipment). Not only is your belief false, it was produced by an unreliable process relative to this new environment. Nevertheless, you still possess an entitlement to this belief, because the perceptual state that produced it (that is, your experience of the round and red apple) is reliably veridical, relative to the normal environment. Because it was interactions with genuine apples (in the actual world) and instances of roundness and redness that helped to establish this type of perceptual state, you retain the epistemic right to believe as your experience represents, even though it is currently not at all indicative of what is going on in this new hostile environment.

We will now consider two criticisms of Burgean entitlement. As for the first criticism, Burge states explicitly that his view of entitlement is not meant to speak to the problem of skepticism. His objective is not to prove that we have perceptual entitlements, but rather to explain on the assumption that we do have them what they are. But some epistemologists might urge that skepticism needs to be addressed in order to get his view off the ground. Skeptical issues have typically been raised in connection with epistemic closure, which states roughly:

(Closure) If subject S is warranted in believing that p, and S knows that p logically entails q, and S deduces q on the basis of p, then S is warranted in believing that q.

Suppose I have a warrant in the form of a Burgean perceptual entitlement to believe HAND (that I have hands). HAND logically entails ~BIV (that I am not a handless brain in a vat). According to Closure, I would be warranted in believing ~BIV were I to deduce it from HAND. But many think this procedure makes it much too easy to secure warrant for beliefs like ~BIV. It is unclear what Burge’s position on this matter is, but it is something he may need to speak to if his view is to be tenable. Note finally that Dretske is not faced with the same problem, because he rejects closure altogether (Dretske 2005).

A different sort of criticism has to do with whether there is any real conceptual difference between how Burge characterizes entitlement and how other epistemologists have characterized justification. Albert Casullo (2009) argues that there is not. As we have seen, the chief distinction between justification and entitlement, according to Burge, is:

(ACC) Justification is warrant that is conceptually accessible to the subject, and entitlement is warrant that need not be conceptually accessible to the subject.

It is not immediately clear, says Casullo, what is meant by the term ‘access’ or ‘accessible’, and he suggests three possible interpretations:

A1) Subject S has access to the warrant for S’s belief that p if S has access to the epistemic ground that warrants S’s belief, that is, to the content of S’s warranting experience or belief.

A2) S has access to the warrant for S’s belief that p if S has access to the adequacy of that ground, that is, to the justification for the belief that S’s ground is adequate to warrant the belief that p.

A3) S has access to the warrant for S’s belief that p if S has access to the epistemic principle governing the ground of S’s belief that p, that is, to the conditions under which the ground warrants the belief that p and the conditions under which that warrant is undermined.

Bearing these separate interpretations in mind, Casullo provides textual evidence from Burge’s works that ACC should be read as claiming that justification satisfies A1 and A3 but not A2, whereas entitlement satisfies A1 but not A2 or A3. But if this is the sense in which entitlements need not be accessible to the subject, this is just the view William Alston (1989b) had already proposed, which he calls an internalist externalism account of justification. Thus, Casullo contends that any differences that exist between Burgean entitlement and Alstonian justification are terminological at best.

3. Wright on Entitlement

Crispin Wright’s approach to entitlement is motivated primarily by an attempt to ward off skeptical paradoxes. In his (2004) paper, “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free)?” he introduces the notion of a “cornerstone proposition” for a given region of thought, according to which “it would follow from a lack of warrant for it that one could not rationally claim warrant for any belief in that region” (p. 167-68). The skeptical project involves two steps: (1) make a case that a certain proposition, which we characteristically accept, is a cornerstone for a much wider class of belief, and (2) argue that we lack warrant for that proposition. Wright then identifies two general patterns of skeptical reasoning that deploy these two steps. The first comes from the Cartesian skeptic, who argues that the proposition that we are not cognitively detached from reality (instances of which come in the more common skeptical-scenario varieties like ‘I am not dreaming’ or ‘I am not a brain in a vat’, and so forth) is a cornerstone proposition for our ordinary perceptual beliefs. As for this latter claim, the skeptic reasons that for any procedure one might utilize to try to determine, say, that one is not dreaming (for example, pinching oneself or trying to read the lines of a newspaper), one must already have an independent warrant for thinking that the procedure was executed properly, and moreover that one did not simply dream carrying it out. But since utilizing any such procedure would require that one already have warrant for believing that one is not dreaming, there is no procedure one could effectively utilize to gain a warrant for this proposition. Thus, our perceptual beliefs are unwarranted.

The second kind of skeptic, the Humean skeptic, reveals an implicit circularity embedded in our practices of inductive reasoning, where the observance of facts about a sample population causes us to make a claim about all of the population’s members (for example, the inference from ‘All observed Fs are G’ to ‘All Fs are G’). The inductive inference relies on one’s being warranted in accepting a cornerstone proposition, which Wright calls the Uniformity Thesis: that nature abounds in regularities. However, there is no way to gain warrant for the Uniformity Thesis, because this could only be accomplished by relying on induction itself (For an overview of the Humean Problem of Induction, see Stroud 1977).

According to Wright, the skeptical problem can be generalized in the following way: Let P be a proposition representing some feature of observable reality (for example, ‘I have hands’), where the best and as the skeptic will argue only evidence in favor of P is rooted in perceptual experience. To arrive at an anti-skeptical conclusion, one will typically deploy what Wright calls the I-II-III argument:

I: My current experience is in all respects as if P

II: P

III: There is a material world

The same argumentative structure can be utilized to refute skepticisms of a variety of subject matters. For instance, where I stands for ‘X’s behavior and physical condition are in all respects as if X is in mental state M’, III stands for ‘There are minds besides my own’. Or where I stands for ‘I seem to remember it being the case that P yesterday’, III stands for ‘The world did not come into being today replete with apparent traces of a more extended history’. Although the I-II-III argument may appear to warrant the conclusion, Wright contests that it engenders a failure of warrant transmission, a notion he has developed (2003). According to Wright, it is oftentimes the case that a body of evidence e is an information-dependent warrant for a proposition P, where e is an information-dependent warrant for P if whether e is correctly regarded as warranting P depends on what one has by way of collateral information C. In cases where C is entailed by P, the warrant for P (which is sourced in e) would fail to transmit to C, were one to infer C from P. Setting the skeptical problem aside for the moment, consider one of Wright’s own examples. Suppose that e is your experience of seeing a ball kicked into a net, from which you infer P, the proposition that a goal has just been scored. Let C be the proposition that a soccer game is in progress. Now, although C is a logical consequence of P, were you to start with e and infer P and subsequently deduce C, this chain of reasoning could not provide you with any new warrant for believing C, because e’s warranting you in believing P presupposes that you already have a warrant for believing C. That is, the warrant for P fails to transmit to C because P cannot be warranted (by e) unless C is something for which you already have warrant.

Returning to the anti-skeptical I-II-III argument, Wright claims that III (‘There is an external world’) is a cornerstone proposition for a range of observation-sourced propositions which may be expressed by II (for example, ‘I have hands’). The point is that whether I successfully warrants II depends on one’s already having warrant for III. But the warrant for III cannot come by way of the I-II-III argument. One crucial difference between this situation and the soccer example is that whereas there are means by which you can secure independent warrant for the proposition that a soccer game is in progress (you can, for example, look up the start time of the game in the local newspaper), there appears to be no way to acquire warrant, independent of one’s experiential evidence, for the proposition that there is an external world. The skeptic will therefore conclude that type-III propositions are unwarranted, and as they are cornerstones so are the associated type-II propositions.

Wright’s aim is not to defend but rather to alleviate skeptical worries. His strategy is to argue that we do possess warrant for type-III cornerstone propositions, but that warrant does not come in the form of evidential justification, as the skeptic assumes it must. He says:

Suppose there is a type of rational warrant which one does not have to do any specific evidential work to earn: better, a type of rational warrant whose possession does not require the existence of evidence in the broadest sense encompassing both a priori and empirical considerations for the truth of the warranted proposition. Call it entitlement. If I am entitled to accept P, then my doing so is beyond rational reproach even though I can point to no cognitive accomplishment in my life, whether empirical or a priori, inferential or non-inferential, whose upshot could reasonably be contended to be that I had come to know that P, or had succeeded in getting evidence justifying P (2004, p. 174-75).

According to Wright, we have entitlements to accept various cornerstone propositions, such as: ‘There is an external world’; ‘There are other minds’; ‘The world has an ancient past’; and ‘There are regularities present in nature’. Entitlement is a kind of rational warrant that, unlike justification, does not depend on one’s having evidence one could point to that would speak to the truth of the proposition in question. Whereas Detective Johnson’s believing that Smith is guilty of the murder is underwritten by her own cognitive accomplishment, by way of basing that belief on recognizable empirical evidence (see Section I above), and is therefore justified, entitlements are secured in a different way. Similar to the views of both Dretske and Burge, having a Wrightean entitlement to accept a proposition does not require that one be able to think about what it is that gives one the entitlement (Wright 2007, Fn 6). If Wright’s proposal is tenable, we find a way to circumvent the skeptical problem: we have unearned warrants (in the form of entitlements) to type-III propositions that are acquired independently of the I-II-III argument. Hence the skeptic has no grounds for accusing the anti-skeptic of viciously circular reasoning.

It is helpful to briefly compare and contrast Wrightean entitlement with the Burgean view discussed in the previous section. One interesting similarity has to do with the connection between entitlement and justification as they relate to the structure of our warranted beliefs. For both Burge and Wright, entitlements reside at the very foundation of the epistemic architecture of our beliefs. All of our justified beliefs are ultimately based upon, or at least presuppose, entitlements. For this reason, defenders of the entitlement-justification distinction are naturally affiliated with foundationalism, the view that there exist warranted beliefs which are not themselves warranted, or justified, by any further beliefs to which one could appeal. In contrast, those who deny that such a distinction exists naturally steer toward coherentism or holism (see Sellars 1963, Davidson 1986, Cohen 2002). However, Burge and Wright differ with respect to the propositions they claim reside at the foundation. As we saw in the previous section, Burgean entitlements attach to beliefs concerning ordinary objects and properties in the world, which are non-inferentially sourced in perception, testimony, and memory. The beliefs we rationally infer on the basis of them are justified. In contrast, Wrightean entitlements attach to cornerstone propositions. Although we do not typically infer further propositions on the basis of them, cornerstones provide the vital preconditions needed for our experiences or memory states to evidentially justify other (type-II) propositions.

Related to this last point, Burge can be seen as taking a liberal stance toward perceptual warrant, in that one’s experience alone provides one with immediate, non-inferential warrant for one’s perceptual beliefs. In contrast, Wright adopts epistemic conservatism, according to which an experience provides warrant for a perceptual belief only on the condition that one has a prior warrant to accept the relevant type-III propositions (The terms ‘liberal’ and ‘conservative’ in epistemology are due to Pryor 2004. See also Wright 2007).

One question that Wright raises is: What do our entitlements give us the right to do? Whereas for both Dretske and Burge our entitlements are rights to believe propositions, Wright has a different answer. He suggests that part of what it is to hold a belief attitude toward a proposition is for that attitude to be controlled by reasoning and evidence. Since entitlements are characteristically unaccompanied by evidence, he denies that they attach to belief. Rather, where P is a proposition to which we have an entitlement, we are entitled to accept P. Acceptance is a general kind of attitude of which belief is only one mode. But, if belief is not the appropriate mode of acceptance for entitlement, what is it? One suggestion Wright considers is ‘acting on the assumption that P’, but he immediately dismisses this because one can surely act on the assumption that a proposition is true while at the same time remaining agnostic or even skeptical of its truth. Because entitlements provide essential preconditions for our having any warrant at all, whatever kind of attitude we have entitlements to must be something wherein one’s coming to doubt its truth would commit one to doubting the competence of the particular project in question. Wright in the end settles on our having an entitlement to rationally trust P, where trust is a kind of acceptance weaker than belief (because it is not controlled by evidence), but stronger than acting on the assumption (because one is non-evidentially committed to the truth of P).

Wright’s position on what we have entitlements to raises a serious question regarding epistemic closure, according to which it is a necessary condition on being justified in believing P that one is also justified in believing those propositions one knows to be entailed by P. Thus, given that my experience as of hands justifies me in believing HAND (the type-II proposition that I have hands), and I know that this entails ~BIV (the type-III proposition that I am not a handless brain in a vat) I must also be justified, according to closure, in believing ~BIV. Yet, although Wright maintains that we have non-evidential entitlements to rationally trust type-III propositions, he denies that we are justified in believing them. His proposal, therefore, appears to be at odds with closure.

In response to this alleged problem, Wright advises that we should qualify standard closure principles in such a way that we need not accept that evidentially justified belief is closed under known entailment. Rather, if we let warrant range disjunctively over both entitlement and justification, we can allow that warranted acceptance (which ranges over belief; taking for granted; rational trust; acting on the assumption; and so forth) is so closed. Thus, given that I am warranted in accepting HAND (in the form of a justified belief), and also that I know HAND entails ~BIV, I am warranted in accepting ~BIV (in the form of an entitled trust). The upshot is that the warrant for a type-III proposition does not come by way inferring it from the related type-II proposition (for the type-II fails to transmit its warrant to the type-III), but this is nonetheless consistent with Wright’s qualified closure principle.

We will now consider two possible objections to Wright’s view. As for the first objection, many will agree that:

(*) If it were antecedently reasonable to reject a type-III proposition, the warrant for the relevant type-II propositions would be removed.

The skeptic takes this thought one step further and concludes that:

(**) Type-II propositions can be warranted only if it is antecedently reasonable to accept type-III propositions.

Wright endorses (**), prompting him to characterize entitlements as positive warrants to trust. However, Martin Davies (2004) has argued that by accepting (**), Wright concedes too much to the skeptic. Instead, Davies claims that the inference from (*) to (**) is invalid: from the fact that my having reasonable doubt that ~BIV would defeat my warrant for believing HAND, it does not follow that I must have warrant for ~BIV in order to have warrant for HAND. An alternative strategy would be to agree that doubt of ~BIV would defeat the warrant for HAND, while at the same time denying that one needs warranted trust in ~BIV in order for my experience as of hands to warrant HAND. Davies thinks both of these claims can be met by attributing a different kind of entitlement to type-III propositions like ~BIV. His suggestion is that we have entitlements not to doubt, not to call in question, or not to bother about, type-III propositions (2004, p. 226). Thus, whereas a Wrightean entitlement is an entitlement to adopt a positive attitude of trust, Davies holds that it is an entitlement to adopt a negative attitude of not doubting; one would not need any positive warrant, earned or unearned, for type-III propositions to have warrant for type-II propositions. One could take this approach one step even further and claim that type-II propositions do, contrary to what Wright says, transmit their warrants to type-III propositions. In other words, the I-II-III argument is epistemically victorious: where I have no reason to doubt that I am a brain in a vat, my experience as of hands warrants me in believing HAND, which thereby warrants me in believing ~BIV when I draw the inference. Whether or not this is a plausible anti-skeptical outcome is highly controversial (For a defense, see Pryor 2000 and 2004; for a rejection, see Cohen 2002).

A second objection to Wright’s view comes from Carrie Jenkins (2007), who has argued that even if we grant Wright that it is rational for us to accept, without evidence, cornerstone propositions, this cannot be an epistemic kind of rationality. For any proposition P, one can be epistemically rational in accepting P only if one’s acceptance is brought about in a way that addresses the specific question of whether P is true. Thus, in order for it to be epistemically rational of you to accept the proposition that China is the most populous country, your coming into this state of acceptance must be due, in part at least, to the fact that you take it to be true that China is the most populous country. However, where P is a cornerstone proposition, like “My sensory apparatus is properly connected to the external world,” one’s acceptance of P is divorced from any considerations on the truth or falsity of P. Instead, on the Wrightean view, accepting P is rational, roughly, because its acceptance is necessary in order to undertake the indispensible cognitive project of forming beliefs about the world based on perception. This is a different kind of rationality, grounded not in terms of whether P is true, but in what fortunate consequences would result from one’s accepting P. This is similar to the sense in which it would be rational (perhaps practically rational) for a runner in a race to believe she is not tired, since the act of forming this belief could actually prevent her from slowing down in the race. It is doubtful that we could have epistemic entitlements to cornerstone propositions without it being epistemically rational to accept them. This creates an obstacle for Wright given that his ultimate aim is to resolve the problem of skepticism in epistemology.

4. Peacocke on Entitlement

In his book, The Realm of Reason, Christopher Peacocke argues that we have entitlements to our perceptual beliefs, a priori beliefs, beliefs based on inductive inference, beliefs about our own actions, and moral beliefs. Our entitlements to the latter four classes of belief are explained as extensions and consequences of the explanatory structure of our entitlement to perceptual beliefs. Accordingly, this section will focus on Peacocke’s account of perceptual entitlement.

Peacocke does not distinguish entitlement from justification in the way that Dretske, Burge, and Wright do. His notion of ‘entitlement’ is intended to range over both inferential and non-inferential transitions between mental states. For Peacocke, entitlement plays a more central role in epistemology, for he claims that a judgment or belief is knowledge only if it is reached by a transition to which the subject is entitled. Indeed, at times he seems to use the terms ‘entitlement’ and ‘justification’ interchangeably. So, whereas for Dretske, Burge, and Wright, entitlements and justifications are distinct epistemic goods that make separable contributions to knowledge, Peacocke seems only to be operating with one epistemic concept, which he frequently refers to as entitlement. As for another difference, we saw that entitlements for Burge and Dretske attach to beliefs, while Wrightean entitlements attach to attitudes of rational trust. For Peacocke, we have entitlements not only to beliefs or judgments, but also to the transitions that link beliefs to antecedent mental states. So, part of what it takes to have a perceptual entitlement to the belief, for example, that there is something round ahead, is that one is also entitled to the transition that brings one from having an experience of something round to the formation of that belief. Nonetheless, a crucial element of Peacockean entitlement common to those of the other three authors discussed in this article is his position that “[a] thinker may be entitled to make a judgment without having the capacity to think about the states which entitle him to make the judgment” (2004, p. 7).

In order to understand Peacocke’s account of perceptual entitlement, it is important first to appreciate two conditions he thinks any transition must meet in order to award a subject an entitlement. The first condition is conveyed in what he calls the Special Truth Conduciveness Thesis:

A fundamental and irreducible part of what makes a transition one to which one is entitled is that the transition tends to lead to true judgments…in a distinctive way characteristic of rational transitions (2004, p. 11).

Here we see that Peacocke agrees with Burge that entitlement (or for Burge, all forms of warrant) must be a good route to truth. A necessary condition on entitlement for both Peacocke and Burge is that whichever state produces the entitled judgment or belief is a reliable indicator of the way things are in the world. Note that this condition is not necessary for Dretskean entitlement, for it could be that a fully responsible agent cannot avoid believing there to be a bright screen ahead of her while her perceptual faculties are in fact highly unreliable (as would be the case were the agent a brain in a vat). But the principle also implies that not just any transition leading to true judgments is sufficient for an entitlement. In addition, the transition must be one that is characteristic of rational transitions. Some processes encompass transitions between states which are highly reliable, yet these transitions are not what we would consider rational. For example, suppose that due to some psychological defect, whenever I see a cardinal fly above me, this visual experience causes me to judge that the St. Louis Cardinals baseball team won today. By sheer coincidence the only time that I see cardinals flying are on days when the Cardinals happen to win. This transition between the state of seeing a cardinal and the state of judging that the Cardinals won tends to lead to true judgments, yet it is clear that it is quite irrational of me to form these judgments (for a similar sort of example, see Bonjour 1985). What, then, is it that distinguishes specifically rational transitions? The answer is given by what Peacocke calls the Rationalist Dependence Thesis, which is the second condition necessary for securing an entitlement:

The rational truth-conduciveness of any given transition to which a thinker is entitled is to be philosophically explained in terms of the nature of the intentional contents and states involved in the transition (2004, p. 52).

According to this second condition, whether or not a transition is rational depends on the specific explanation for why that transition is reliable. The feature that is characteristic of rational transitions, according to Peacocke, is that they are reliable because of the very nature of the mental states involved, the contents that they have and how it is that those states are capable of representing the world in a certain way. If the reliability of some transition is explained by something other than the very identity of the states involved in the transition and the individuation of their contents (such as if it were some mere accident that a type of experience reliably led to true judgments, as in the cardinal example above), then that transition, though reliable, would not be rational and would therefore fail to yield any entitlement.

With the two above theses introduced, we see that transitions between states yield entitlements only if they are conducive to truth, and furthermore their being reliable can be philosophically explained in terms of the states involved in the transition. With regard to perceptual entitlement in particular, the kinds of experiences Peacocke thinks are relevant to meeting this criterion are those which have instance-individuated contents, such as the experience expressed by “That thing looks round.” What makes this experience’s content instance-individuated is that when one’s perceptual faculties are properly functioning, and the environment is normal, one’s having this experience with this content is “caused by the holding of the condition which is in fact the correctness condition for that content” (2004, p. 67). In simpler terms, the correct perceptual representation of an object as round does not causally depend on any other mental states or relations aside from the subject’s being properly connected to that round object in the world. In contrast, an experience expressed by “There looks to be a soldier over there” does not have instance-individuated content because one’s correctly representing a soldier causally depends not only on there being a soldier where one represents it as being, but also on the background empirical knowledge one needs to have of what it is to be a soldier, how soldiers typically dress, and so on.

A Peacockean perceptual entitlement can thus be described as follows: “A subject enjoying an experience with a content which is instance-individuated is entitled to judge that content (that is, accept that experience at face value), in the absence of reasons for doubting that she is perceiving properly.” Note that in the presence of reasons for doubt, one’s entitlement is removed. Thus, Peacockean entitlement, like that of Dretske, Burge and Wright, has defeasibility conditions built into it.

The central task for Peacocke is to offer a philosophical explanation of the entitlement relation between experiences with instance-individuated contents and their corresponding perceptual judgments, which will consist of an a priori argument that demonstrates that the transitions between these states are conducive to truth. His strategy is to argue that the existence of perceptual experiences with instance-individuated contents is best explained by the fact that those experiences are produced by a device that evolved by natural selection to represent the world to the subject, and that the perceptual experiences produced in the subject are predominantly correct. Moreover, judgments based on these experiences are likely to be true. To defend this claim, he relies on what he calls the Complexity Reduction Principle:

Other things equal, good explanations of complex phenomena explain the more complex in terms of the less complex; they reduce complexity (2004, p. 83).

This principle describes a key feature of what makes an explanation a good one. When we are presented with some complex phenomenon, the explanation we should endorse, out of all the alternatives, is the one that explains the phenomenon in the least complex terms. By accepting this principle, we are accepting that “it is…more rational to hold, other things equal, that [things] have come about in an easy, rather than in a highly improbable, way” (2004, p. 83). Consider one of Peacocke’s own cases stemming from natural science. Every snowflake contains six identical patterns separated by sixty-degree segments around its center. This is an example of a complex phenomenon, one that immediately strikes us as highly improbable. The best explanation for why snowflakes exhibit this pattern will inform us, by reducing complexity, that the alleged improbability is merely apparent: oxygen molecules in frozen water are roughly spherical and they are arranged on a plane. The frozen crystals grow in a way that minimizes energy, and the most energy-efficient way of packing spheres on a plane results in a hexagonal arrangement (2004, p. 75-6). One possible alternative explanation could be that snowflakes are built on skeletons that exhibit six-fold symmetry. However, the latter explanation is less preferable to the former, because the latter is no less complex than the phenomenon itself: we would simply shift the question to why it is that the skeleton, rather than the snowflake, exhibits this pattern.

Like the example of snowflakes, our having experiences with instance-individuated contents is a highly complex phenomenon. That the perceptual system produces states that are in large part correct, and was naturally selected to accurately represent the world to the subject, explains the phenomenon with the least amount of complexity. A subject’s being in a state of perceptually representing an object o as having property F would not appear improbable if an Fo in the environment caused the state, and the subject had a properly functioning system that had adapted over the millennia, by way of interacting with objects like o’s and properties like F-ness, to accurately represent features in the environment. It is a virtue of this explanation that it does not posit any further representational states that are equally as complex as the perceptual states under discussion and are, in turn, in need of explanation.

Peacocke argues further that the proposed explanation succeeds at reducing complexity better than alternative skeptical hypotheses. There are two general types of such hypotheses he considers. The first is one in which the subject’s illusory perceptual states are produced by some intentional agent, such as the Cartesian Demon. In this scenario, it is typically postulated that the deceiver either has experiences herself, in which case our perceptual states get explained in terms of another’s perceptual states, or she lacks experiences but has other intentional states with comparable complexity. Either way, the hypothesis purporting to explain the phenomenon under discussion would stand in need of further explanation. In the second type of skeptical hypothesis, our illusory experiences are not intentionally produced, but are instead generated randomly or coincidentally, such as your being a member of a randomly generated universe containing nothing but a population of deluded brains in vats (see Putnam 2000). However, this sort of hypothesis involves highly complex initial conditions, such as the original set up describing how the vats are capable of producing conscious, intentional states. Thus, it fails to reduce the complexity of the phenomenon of our having perceptual states.

To summarize, Peacocke justifies the claim that we are entitled to form judgments about the world on the basis of our experiences with instance-individuated contents, on the grounds that our having these experiences with these contents is best explained by the evolution of the perceptual system and its selection for accurate representation of the environment. We will consider a number of criticisms of Peacocke’s view. First, in attempting to give a philosophical explanation of the truth-conduciveness of the transition between experience and judgment, we have seen that Peacocke invokes the theory of natural selection. But because his aim is to prove that our experiences are by and large correct, his argument cannot depend on any empirically justified premises. However, natural selection is an empirical scientific theory that is justified in part by our experiences, so we should not expect that it could be used to answer the skeptic. Peacocke insists though that his argument “does not have the truth of the whole empirical biological theory of evolution by natural selection as one of its premises” (2004, p. 98). But if Peacocke’s argument is sound, and he is right that each premise is justified a priori, the implication, as Ralph Wedgwood (2007) notes, is that no scientific investigation was required whatsoever for Darwin to justify the claim that he evolved through natural selection—all he needed to do to learn that the theory of evolution is true was to engage in philosophical contemplation and to reflect on his own experiences. But the suggestion that a theory such as this one could be justified a priori seems highly implausible.

Another challenge to Peacocke’s project is to question whether the natural selection-based explanation reduces complexity any more than the alternative explanations. The skeptic will argue that the existence of living creatures and the evolution of psychological systems within some of its members is itself a complex phenomenon standing in need of further explanation. In addition, the skeptic could reject the Complexity Reduction Principle altogether: that an explanation is simpler, or succeeds at reducing complexity, does not speak to whether it is the one we ought to accept (see Lycan 1988; for Peacocke’s response see 2004, p. 94-7).

Finally, even if we grant that the Complexity Reduction Principle is true and that the natural selection-based explanation demonstrates that judgments sourced in perception tend toward truth, one might still question whether it adequately demonstrates how transitions between experience and judgment are characteristically rational (that is, whether it appropriately conforms to the Rationalist Dependence Thesis). In order for us to rationally rely on our (reliably accurate) experiences, is it the case that we must also know, or justifiably believe, that the natural selection-based explanation most reduces complexity? Peacocke thinks the answer must be negative; otherwise, anyone unaware of the Complexity Reduction Principle (which, presumably, is most people) would lack entitlements to their perceptual beliefs, and moreover would lack perceptual knowledge. Instead, he holds that it is sufficient that the transition from experience to judgment be rational from the subject’s own point of view, that is, that the subject appreciates that her experiential grounds for the transition to the judgment that P suffice for the truth of P (2004, p. 176). However, Miguel Fernández (2006) notes a problem with this move. When one comes to “appreciate one’s grounds,” this involves, at least on a natural interpretation of appreciate, that one forms an additional judgment, specifically, a second-order judgment of the form:

SOJ: This experience representing P provides adequate grounds for the truth of P.

Of course, if one’s judgment that SOJ is partially underwriting one’s entitlement to judge that P, then it must be that the transition leading one to judge SOJ is also rational from the subject’s own point of view. To meet this requirement, however, one would need to then hold a third-order judgment of the form:

TOJ: My grounds for judging SOJ are adequate for the truth of SOJ.

The problem is that because TOJ would also need to be rational from the subject’s own point of view, we are forced into an implausible infinite regress of increasingly higher-order judgments, each used to rationalize the transition attached to the lower-ordered judgment. Demanding that one form all of these judgments would seem to hyper-intellectualize perceptual entitlement, and it would go against Peacocke’s position, mentioned at the beginning of the section, that a subject can be entitled to a judgment without having the capacity to think about the states that entitle that judgment. In order to avoid this undesirable outcome, Peacocke could attempt to elucidate the notion of “appreciating one’s grounds” in a way that does not suggest forming a higher-order judgment. Or, if that option is not feasible, he could, in following Dretske and Burge, relinquish the requirement altogether that a transition be rational from the subject’s own point of view.

5. Conclusion

This article has explored the views of epistemic entitlement as presented by four prominent philosophers: Dretske, Burge, Wright, and Peacocke. As we have seen, there are important similarities and differences among these views. Burge and Peacocke both hold that reliability is necessary for enjoying perceptual entitlements, but also that the reliability must be explained in terms of the nature and individuation of the perceptual states involved. For both Wright and Peacocke, their accounts of entitlement purport to provide anti-skeptical outcomes about knowledge, while Dretskean and Burgean entitlement is explained independently of the skeptical problem. According to Dretske and Burge we have entitlements to hold various non-inferential beliefs. In contrast, Wright holds that what we are entitled to do is to rationally trust certain corner stone propositions, like that there is an external world and there is a past. Peacocke differs from the other three authors in that he claims that all rational judgments, as well as the transitions leading to those judgments, are underwritten by entitlements. Despite these differences, one element common to each of the views we have discussed is the idea that entitlements are defeasible epistemic rights that are not grounded in conceptually accessible reasons or evidence. One can have an entitlement even if one is unable to think about the states that provide the entitlement. In this regard, distinguishing entitlement from justification has the advantage of attributing a kind of positive epistemic status to individuals who lack the critical reasoning skills needed to justify their own beliefs. The inclusion of the concept of entitlement therefore steers away from hyper-intellectualizing the warrant for our basic beliefs about the world.

6. References and Further Reading

Alston W. (1989). Epistemic Justification: Essays in the Theory of Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
- A collection of essays on justification and knowledge written by William Alston.
Alston, W. (1989a). “The Deontological Conception of Epistemic Justification.” in Alston (1989).
- Provides a series of arguments against deontological views of justification which center around the concepts of duty, praiseworthy, requirement, blameless by relying heavily on the impossibility of our having control over our beliefs.
Alston, W. (1989b). “An Internalist Externalism.” in Alston (1989).
- Attempts to reconcile the internalism/externalism debate in epistemology by advancing a view of justification that incorporates both internalist and externalist elements.
Bach, K. (1985). “A Rationale for Reliabilism.” The Monist, 68: 246-265.
- Defends reliabilism against its more well-known objections by drawing a distinction between a justified belief and a subject’s being justified in holding a belief.
Bonjour, L. (1985). The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Develops an anti-foundationalist, coherentist theory of knowledge.
Burge, T. (1993). “Content Preservation.” The Philosophical Review, 102 (4): 457-488.
- Argues that we have non-inferential entitlements to rely on the testimony of others.
Burge T. (1996). “Our Entitlement to Self-knowledge.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 96 (1): 91-116.
- Argues that we have entitlements to beliefs about our own mental states.
Burge, T. (2003). “Perceptual Entitlement.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 67 (3): 503-548.
- Provides a teleological account of perceptual entitlements as grounded in the anti-individualistic nature of perception.
Burge, T. (2005). “Disjunctivism and Perceptual Psychology.” Philosophical Topics, 33 (1): 1-78.
- Argues against the view of perception called Disjunctivism on the grounds that it conflicts with established psychological theories of vision.
Burge T. (2007). Foundations of Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A collection of Burge’s papers in philosophy of mind on anti-individualism.
Burge, T. (2007a). “Cartesian Error and the Objectivity of Perception.” in Burge (2007).
- Defends the claim that our perceptual states are anti-individualistically individuated and introduces his famous Crack-Shadow thought experiment.
Casullo, A. (2009). “What is Entitlement?” Acta Analytica, 22: 267-279.
- Provides a detailed overview and critique of Burge’s proposed distinction between entitlement and justification.
Chisholm, R. (1977). Theory of Knowledge. (2^nd edition) Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
- Defends a deontological conception of knowledge and justification.
Cohen, S. (2002). “Basic Knowledge and the Problem of Easy Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 65 (2): 309-329.
- Denies the existence of basic knowledge (knowledge obtained from a source prior to one’s knowing that that source is reliable) through considerations involving closure and bootstrapping.
Comesaña, J. (2002). “The Diagonal and the Demon.” Philosophical Studies, 110: 249-266.
- Advances a new version of reliabilism called Indexical Reliabilism, then argues it circumvents the New Evil Demon Problem.
Conee, E and Feldman, R. (1985). “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies, 48: 15-34.
- Defends evidentialism in epistemology, the view that the justification of one’s belief is determined by the strength of one’s evidence for that belief.
Davidson, D. (1986). “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge.” in E. Lepore (ed.) Truth and Interpretation: Perspectives on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson. Blackwell Publishing.
- Argues for coherentism about truth and knowledge.
Davies, M. (2004). “Epistemic Entitlement, Warrant Transmission and Easy Knowledge.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Issue 78 (1): 213-245.
- Critically discusses Crispin Wright’s views on entitlement, and advances the idea of a negative entitlement not to doubt cornerstone propositions.
Dretske, F. (2000). “Entitlement: Epistemic Rights without Epistemic Duties?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 60 (3): 591-606.
- Argues for the existence of epistemic entitlements as grounded in the immediacy and irresistibility of various beliefs and motivated by the New Evil Demon Problem.
Dretske, F. (2005). “The Case Against Closure.” in M. Steup and E. Sosa (eds.) Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishing.
- Rejects closure by first assuming skepticism is false, and secondly by arguing for the disjunction that either closure is false or skepticism is true.
Evans, G. (1982). The Varieties of Reference. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Proposes a theory of demonstrative thought in this seminal work, and introduces the notion of nonconceptual content.
Fernandez. M. (2006). “Troubles with Peacocke’s Rationalism.” Critica, 38 (112): 81-103.
- Critically discusses Christopher Peacocke’s (2004) book, The Realm of Reason.
Ginet, C. (1975). Knowledge, Perception, and Memory. Dordrecht: D. Reidel.
- Argues for a strong version of internalism, according to which all of the facts that make a subject’s beliefs justified are directly recognizable by the subject upon reflection.
Goldman, A. (1986). Epistemology and Cognition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Makes a case for epistemology to draw upon the findings in cognitive science.
Goldman. A. (1988). “Strong and Weak Justification.” Philosophical Perspectives, 2: 51-69.
- Advances a modified version of reliabilism that places a distinction between the concepts of strong justification and weak justification.
Heck, R. (2007). “Are There Different Kinds of Content?” in B. McLaughlin and J. Cohen (eds.), Contemporary Debates in Philosophy of Mind. Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishing.
- Argues for the existence of nonconceptual content based on the implausibility of perceptual content, satisfying Gareth Evans’ generality constraint on thought.
Henderson, D. and Horgan, T. (2007). “Some Ins and Outs of Transglobal Reliabilism.” in S. Goldberg (ed.), Internalism and Externalism in Semantics and Epistemology. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Advances a new version of reliabilism called transglobal reliabilism, according to which the reliability of a belief process is evaluated relative to the set of experientially possible global environments.
Janvid, M. (2009). “The Value of Lesser Goods: The Epistemic Value of Entitlement.” Acta Analytica, 24: 263-274.
- Compares the epistemic value of entitlement with that of justification, and criticizes both Burgean and Dretskean entitlement.
Jenkins, C. (2007). “Entitlement and Rationality.” Synthese, 157: 25-45.
- Challenges Crispin Wright’s entitlement of cognitive project, arguing that such entitlement to accept a proposition cannot be construed as epistemically rational.
Lehrer, K and Cohen, S. (1983). “Justification, Truth, and Coherence.” Synthese, 55: 191-207.
- Challenges the time-honored connection between justification and truth by introducing what is nowadays commonly referred to as the New Evil Demon Problem.
Lycan, W. (1988). Judgement and Justification. Cambridge, MA: Cambridge University Press.
- Defends a version of epistemological explanationism as a theory of justification.
Majors, B. (2005). “The New Rationalism.” Philosophical Papers, 34 (2): 289-305.
- A critical discussion of Christopher Peacocke’s (2004) book, The Realm of Reason.
Majors, B and Sawyer, S. (2005). “The Epistemological Argument for Content Externalism.” Philosophical Perspectives, 19: 257-280.
- Argues that that the only epistemological view that can adequately account for the constitutive relation between justification and truth is one that involves a commitment to content externalism.
Millikan, R. (1984). Language, Thought and Other Biological Categories. Cambridge, MA: MIT press.
- Develops a naturalistic account of language and thought, wherein the meaning associated with sentences and the intentionality associated with thoughts are to be explicated in terms of how sentences and thoughts properly function.
Peacocke, C. (1992). A Study of Concepts. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Proposes a theory of concepts in which concepts are individuated by their possession conditions, and also introduces the notions of ‘scenario content’ and ‘protoproposition’ as they apply to perceptual content.
Peacocke, C. (2001). “Does Perception have a Nonconceptual Content?” Journal of Philosophy, 98: 609-615.
- Defends the claim that perception has nonconceptual content, and wards off criticisms from John McDowell and Bill Brewer.
Peacocke, C. (2004). The Realm of Reason. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Develops a rationalist picture of epistemic entitlement according to which we have entitlements to our perceptual beliefs, a priori beliefs, beliefs based on inductive inference, beliefs about our own actions, and moral beliefs.
Pryor, J. (2000). “The Skeptic and the Dogmatist.” Nous, 34: 517-49.
- Defends dogmatism, a modest foundationalist view according to which an experience as of p’s being the case provides one with a prima facie justification to believe that p, without requiring that one have independent reason to believe one is not in a skeptical scenario.
Pryor, J. (2001). “Recent Highlights of Epistemology.” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 52: 95-124.
- Canvases a host of popular topics in contemporary epistemology, including contextualism, modest foundationalism, the internalism/externalism debate, and the ethics of belief.
Pryor, J. (2004). “What’s wrong with Moore’s Argument?” Philosophical Issues, 14: 349-378.
- Defends the Moorean response to skepticism.
Putnam, H. (2000). “Brains in a Vat.” in S. Bernecker and F. Dretske (eds.), Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology. Oxford University Press.
- Appeals to externalist accounts of meaning to argue that the statement, “I am a brain in a vat,” is self-defeating, and so cannot be true.
Sellars, W. (1963). Science, Perception and Reality. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
- Famously argues against the “Myth of the Given” and develops a broadly coherentist epistemology.
Stroud, B. (1977). Hume. New York: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
- Offers a detailed overview of Hume’s philosophy, including the Problem of Induction.
Wedgwood, R. (2007). “Christopher Peacocke’s The Realm of Reason.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 74 (3): 776-791.
- Critically discusses Christopher Peacocke’s book, The Realm of Reason.
Williams, M. (2000). “Dretske on Epistemic Entitlement.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 60 (3): 607-612.
- Critically discusses Fred Dretske’s (2000) paper, “Entitlement: Epistemic Rights without Epistemic Duties?”
Wright, C. (2003). “Some Reflections on the Acquisition of Warrant by Inference” in S. Nuccetelli (ed.), New Essays on Semantic Externalism, Skepticism and Self-Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Explains the difference between a cogent argument and an argument in which the premises fails to transmit their warrants to the conclusion.
Wright, C. (2004). “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free)?” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume, 78 (1):167–212.
- Develops the notion of unearned entitlements for cornerstone propositions, and explores the prospects and limitations on strategic entitlement, entitlement of cognitive project, entitlement of rational deliberation, and entitlement of substance.
Wright, C. (2007). “The Perils of Dogmatism.” in S. Nuccetelli and G. Seay (eds.), Themes from G. E. Moore: New Essays in Epistemology and Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Presents a series of problems for dogmatist accounts of justification.

Author Information

Jon Altschul
Email: jlaltsch@loyno.edu
Loyola University-New Orleans
U. S. A.

The Theory-Theory of Concepts

The Theory-Theory of concepts is a view of how concepts are structured, acquired, and deployed. Concepts, as they will be understood here, are mental representations that are implicated in many of our higher thought processes, including various forms of reasoning and inference, categorization, planning and decision making, and constructing and testing explanations. The view states that concepts are organized within and around theories, that acquiring a concept involves learning such a theory, and that deploying a concept in a cognitive task involves theoretical reasoning, especially of a causal-explanatory sort.

The term “Theory-Theory” derives from Adam Morton (1980), who proposed that our everyday understanding of human psychology constitutes a kind of theory by which we try to predict and explain behavior in terms of its causation by beliefs, intentions, emotions, traits of character, and so on. The idea that psychological knowledge and understanding might be explained as theory possession also derives from Premack & Woodruff’s famous 1978 article, “Does the Chimpanzee Have a Theory of Mind?” A Theory-Theory in general is thus a proposal to explain a certain psychological capacity in terms of a tacit or explicit internally represented theory of a domain. The Theory-Theory of concepts, however, goes beyond the mere claim that we possess such theories, saying in addition that some or all of our concepts are constituted by their essential connections with these theories.

The origins of the Theory-Theory involve several converging lines of investigation. First, it arose as part of a general critique of the formerly dominant prototype theory of concepts; second, it was an empirically-motivated response to the shortcomings of the developmental theories of Piaget and Vygotsky; and third, it involved applying ideas from Kuhn’s philosophy of science to explain phenomena having to do with the development of cognition in individuals. While the theory has often been vaguely formulated, due in large part to the open-endedness inherent in the central notion of a theory, there are substantial bodies of empirical evidence that underlie the main tenets of the view. In particular, the Theory-Theory has been responsible for largely displacing the notion that cognitive development starts from a simple base of perceptual primitives grouped together by similarity. Rather, it is guided by domain-specific explanatory expectations at many stages, and these expectations can be seen to function in adult reasoning and categorization as well. While strong versions of the Theory-Theory have been subject to numerous objections, these contributions endure and continue to shape what many scholars claim are the best existing models of higher cognition.

Background
The Theory-Theory
Support for the Theory-Theory
1. Cognitive Development
2. Adult Categorization, Inference, and Learning
Relations to Other Views
1. Relations to Essentialism
2. Relations to Causal Modeling Approaches
Objections to the Theory-Theory
Disanalogies Between Development and Science
Conclusions
References and Further Reading

1. Background

The Theory-Theory emerged in part as a reaction to existing trends in the psychology of concepts and categorization, which during the late 1970’s was dominated by the prototype theory of concepts. Exemplar models were also being developed during this time, but the prototype theory encapsulated many of the views which were the foils against which the Theory-Theory developed its main assumptions.

Prototype theory derives in large part from the work of Eleanor Rosch and her collaborators (Rosch, 1977; Rosch & Mervis, 1975; see Smith & Medin, 1981 for historical perspective and Hampton, 1995 for a canonical statement of the view). These theories assume that concepts represent statistical information about the categories that they pick out. The concept tree represents the properties that people take to be typical of trees: they have bark, they can grow to be relatively tall, they have green leaves that may change color, they have a certain silhouette, birds often nest in them, they grow potentially edible fruits, and so on. These comprise the tree prototype (or stereotype).

This stereotype is acquired by a process of abstraction from examples: individual trees are perceptually salient parts of the environment, and by repeated perception of such category instances, one gradually forms a summary representation that ‘averages’ the qualities of the trees one has observed. This summary is often represented as a list of features that belong to category members. Properties that are more frequently perceived in the instances will be assigned a greater feature weight in the prototype. This process of concept acquisition is often portrayed as a passive one.

Finally, novel objects are categorized as falling under a prototype concept in virtue of their similarity to the prototype—that is, by how many features they share with it (weighted by those features’ importance). Similarity computations also explain other phenomena, such as the fact that some objects are better examples of a category than others (flamingos and penguins are atypical birds since they lack most of the prototypical bird features).

The prototype theory has several characteristics which made it a fitting target for Theory theorists. First, it suggests that concepts have a basically superficial nature. Often, though not invariably, features in prototypes were assumed to be readily perceivable. Prototype theory was thus affiliated with a certain empiricist bent. This was reinforced by the fact that prototypes are acquired by a simple statistical-associative process akin to that assumed by classical empiricists. Second, prototype theory involved a relatively impoverished account of conceptual development and deployment. Concepts passively adjust themselves to new stimuli, and these stimuli activate stored concepts in virtue of their resemblances, but there is little role for active revision or reflective deployment of these concepts. In the wake of the anti-empiricist backlash that gave rise to contemporary cognitive science, particularly in cognitive-developmental psychology, these assumptions were ripe for questioning.

2. The Theory-Theory

a. Origins of the View

The Theory-Theory itself has a somewhat complicated origin story, with roots in a number of philosophical and psychological doctrines. One is the reaction against stage theories of cognitive development, particularly Piagetian and Vygotskian theories. Stage theories propose that children’s cognitive development follows a rigid and universal script, with a fixed order of transitions from one qualitatively distinct form of thought to another taking place across all domains on the same schedule. Each stage is characterized by a distinctive set of representations and processes. In Piaget’s theory, children move through sensorimotor, preoperational, concrete operational, and formal operational stages from birth to roughly 11 or 12 years old. Similarly, Vygotsky held that children move from a stage of representing categories in terms of sensory images of individual objects, through a stage of creating representations of objectively unified categories, and finally a stage of categories arranged around abstract, logical relationships.

While Piaget and Vygotsky’s stage theories differ, both hold that early childhood thought is characterized by representation of categories in terms of their perceivable properties and the inability to reason abstractly (causally or logically) about these categories. Early childhood cognition, in short, involves being perceptually bound. While the empirical basis and explanatory structure of these theories had been challenged before (see R. Gelman & Baillargeon, 1983 and Wellman & Gelman, 1988 for review), Theory theorists such as Carey (1985), Gopnik (1988, 1996), Gopnik & Meltzoff (1997), and Keil (1989) went beyond providing disconfirming evidence and began to lay out an alternative positive vision of how cognitive development proceeds.

A second root of the Theory-Theory derives from philosophy of science, particularly from Kuhn’s account of theory change and scientific revolutions. Kuhn’s view is too complex to summarize here, but two aspects of it have been particularly influential in developmental psychology.

One is Kuhn’s notion that theory change in science involves periods of ‘normal science’, during which a mature theory is applied successfully to a range of phenomena, and periods of ‘paradigm shifting’. A paradigm shift occurs when counterevidence to a theory has built up beyond a certain threshold and it can no longer be adequately modified in response, consistent with its not becoming intolerably ad hoc. In paradigm shifts, new explanatory notions and models take center stage, and old ones may be pushed to the margins or adopt new roles. New practices and styles of experimentation become central. These changes are relatively discontinuous compared with the usual gradual accumulation of changes and modifications characteristic of science.

A second, connected with this notion of a paradigm shift, is the Kuhnian doctrine of incommensurability. This is the idea that when new theories are constructed, the central explanatory concepts of the old theory often change their meaning, so that a claim made before and after a paradigm shift, even if it uses the same words, may not express the same proposition, since those words now express different concepts. The concept of mass, as it existed in pre-relativistic physics, no longer means the same thing—indeed, we now need to distinguish between uses of ‘mass’ that pick out rest mass and those that pick out relativistic mass. Often this involves creating new concepts that cannot be captured in the conceptual vocabulary of the old theory, differentiating two concepts that were previously conflated, or coalescing two previously distinct concepts into one. In all of these cases, the expressive vocabulary of the new conceptual scheme is not equivalent to that of the old scheme. Theory theorists have often adopted both the Kuhnian claim about paradigm shifts as a model for understanding certain phenomena in development, and the associated claim of semantic or conceptual incommensurability (Carey, 1991).

A third root involves what Keil (1989) dubs the rejection of ‘Original Sim’. Original Sim is roughly the view of category structure and learning suggested by prototype theory, particular an empiricist one. This view is most clearly defended by Quine (1977), who proposes that children begin life with an innate similarity space that is governed by perceptual information, and over time begin to develop theoretical structures that supersede these initial groupings. On this empiricist perspective, children’s first concepts should be bundles of perceptual features, typically consisting of intrinsic rather than relational properties, and categorization should be simply a matter of matching the perceived features of a novel object to those of the concept. Inductive inferences concerning a category are within reach so long as they are confined to these observable properties, and objects share inductive potential to the extent that they are similar to the perceptual prototype. Moreover, these perceptual prototypes are assumed to be acquired by statistical tabulation of observed co-occurrences in the world, in a relatively theory-free way; seeing that certain furry quadrupeds meow is sufficient for constructing a cat concept that encodes these properties. It is only at later stages of development that concepts reflect understanding of the hidden structure of categories, and come to enable inductions that go beyond such similarities.

Fourth, Theory-Theory is often motivated by the hypothesis that certain concepts (or categories) have a kind of coherence that makes them seem especially non-arbitrary (Murphy & Medin, 1985; Medin & Wattenmaker, 1987). The categories of diamonds, sports cars, or otters seem to be relatively ‘coherent’ in the sense that their members bear interesting and potentially explainable relations to one another: diamonds are made of carbon atoms whose organization explains their observable properties, otters share a common ancestry and genetic-developmental trajectory that explain their phenotype and behavior, and so forth. On the other hand, the category of things on the left side of my desk, or things within 100 feet of the Eiffel Tower, or things that are either electrons or clown wigs, do not. They are simply arbitrary collections.

Feature-based theories of concepts, such as prototype theory, seem to have particular difficulty explaining the phenomenon of coherence, since they are inherently unconstrained and allow any set of properties to be lumped together to form a category, whereas our concepts often appear to represent categories as involving more than merely sets of ad hoc co-instantiated properties. They include relations among these properties, as well as explanatory connections of various sorts. We don’t merely think of sports cars as expensive artifacts with four wheels, big engines, a sleek shape, and bright coloration, which make a loud noise as they roar past at high speed. These features are explanatorily connected in various ways: their shape and engine size contribute to their speed, their engines explain their noisiness, their speed and attractive appearance explain their costliness, and so on. Insofar as these explanatory relations among properties are represented, concepts themselves are more coherent, reflecting our implicit belief in the worldly coherence of their categories. Theories are the conceptual glue that makes many of our everyday and scientific concepts coherent, and models of concepts that fail to accord theories an important role are missing an account of a crucial phenomenon (however, see Margolis, 1999 for detailed criticism of this notion).

From this survey, it should be clear that the development of Theory theories of concepts has been driven by a host of different motivations and pressures. Hence there exist many flavors of the view, each with its own distinctive formulation, concerns, and central phenomena. However, despite the fact that the view lacks a canonical statement, it possesses a set of family resemblances that make it an interesting source of predictions and a robust framework for empirical research, as well as a unified target of criticism.

b. Theories Defined

The first essential posit of these views is the notion of a mentally represented theory. Theories are bodies of information (or, as psychologists and linguists sometimes say, bodies of knowledge) about a particular domain. Such theories have been posited to explain numerous psychological capacities: linguistic competence results from a theory of the grammar of English or Urdu; mental state attribution results from a theory of mind; even visual perception results from a theory of how 3-D objects in space behave in relation to the observer. But theories are not just any body of information held in memory. What makes theories distinctive or special? Keil (1989, p. 279) called this “the single most important problem for future research” in the Theory-Theory tradition.

Gopnik & Meltzoff (1997, pp. 32-41) give what is probably the most comprehensive set of conditions on theories. These conditions fall into three categories: structural, functional, and dynamic. Structurally, theories are abstract, coherent, causally organized, and ontologically committed bodies of information. They are abstract in that they posit entities and laws using a vocabulary that differs from the vocabulary used to state the evidence that supports them. They are coherent in that there are systematic relations between the entities posited by the theory and the evidence. Theories are causal insofar as the structure that they posit in the world to explain observable regularities is ordinarily a causal one. Finally, they are ontologically committed if the entities that they posit correspond to real kinds, and also support counterfactuals about how things would be under various non-actual circumstances. Some of these conditions are also advanced by Keil (1989, p. 280), who proposes that causal relations are central to theories, especially where they are homeostatic and hierarchically organized.

Functionally, theories must make predictions, interpret evidence in new ways, and provide explanations of phenomena in their domain. The predictions of theories go beyond simple generalizations of the evidence, and include ranges of phenomena that the theory was not initially developed to cover. Theories interpret evidence by providing new descriptions that influence what is seen as relevant or salient and what is not. And crucially, theories provide explanations of phenomena, understood as an abstract, coherent causal account of how the phenomena are produced and sustained. Theories are essentially related to the phenomena that make up their domain; hence in Keil’s developed view, there is a key role for associative relations in providing the raw data for theoretical development as well as a ‘fallback’ for when theories run out (Keil, 1989, p. 281).

Last, theories are not static representations, but have dynamic properties. This follows from the fact that they develop in response to, and may gain in credibility or be defeated by, the empirical evidence. The sorts of dynamic properties that characterize theories include: an initial period involving the accumulation of evidence via processes of experimentation and observation, the discovery of counterevidence, the possible discounting of such evidence as noise, the generation of ad hoc hypotheses to amend a theory, the production of a new theory when an old one has accumulated too much contrary evidence or too many ugly and complicated auxiliary amendments.

c. Concepts in Theories Versus Concepts as Theories

Once the central explanatory construct of a mental theory is clear, two varieties of the Theory-Theory need to be distinguished. These views differ on the nature of the relationship between concepts and theories.

On the concepts in theories view, concepts are the constituents of theories. Theories are understood as something like bodies of beliefs or other propositional representations, and these beliefs have concepts as their constituents. The belief that electrons are negatively charged is part of our theory of electrons, and that belief contains the concept electron as a part (as well as has negative charge). The set of electron, involving beliefs that meet the sorts of constraints laid out in section 2b, constitute one’s theory of electrons. These beliefs describe the sorts of things electrons are, how they can be expected to behave, how they are detected, how they relate to other fundamental physical entities, how they can be exploited for practical purposes, and so on. For the concepts in theories view, concepts function much like theoretical terms.

On the concepts as theories view, on the other hand, the constituency relations run the opposite direction. Concepts themselves are identified with miniature theories of a particular domain. For instance, Keil (1989, p. 281) proposes that “[m]ost concepts are partial theories themselves in that they embody explanations of the relations between their constituents, of their origins, and of their relations to other clusters of features.” So the concept electron would itself be made up of various theoretical postulates concerning electrons, their relationship to other particles, their causal propensities which explain phenomena in various domains of physics, and so on. Concepts are not terms in theories, they are themselves theories.

As stated, the concepts in theories view is scarcely controversial. If people possess mentally represented theories at all, then those theories are composed of beliefs and concepts, and so at least some of our concepts are embedded in theory-like knowledge structures. Call this the weak concepts in theories view. A strong concepts in theories view, on the other hand, says that not only are concepts embedded in theories, but they are also individuated by those theories. Carey (1985, p. 198) seems to hold this view: “Concepts must be identified by the roles they play in theories.” This is just to say that what makes them the very concepts that they are is their relationships (inferential, associative, causal, explanatory, and so forth.) with the other concepts and beliefs in the theory. There are many ways of carving out different notions of inferential or theoretically significant roles for concepts to play, but on all of them, concepts are constituted by their relations to other concepts and to the evidence that governs their conditions of application.

A consequence seems to be that if those relationships change, or if the theory itself changes in certain respects, then the concepts change as well. The change from a view on which atoms are the smallest, indivisible elements of matter to one on which atoms are made up of more fundamental particles might represent a sufficiently central and important change that the concept atom itself is no longer the same after such a transition takes place; similarly, perhaps the victory of anti-vitalism entailed a change in the concept life from being essentially linked with a particular irreducible vital force to being decoupled from such commitments. Notice that this consequence also applies to the concepts as theories view. If a concept is identified with a theory (rather than being merely embedded in it), it seems as if, prima facie, any change to the theory is a change to the concept.

The concepts as theories view poses separate difficulties of its own. On this view, concepts are extremely complex data structures composed of some sort of theoretical principles, laws, generalizations, explanatory connections, and so on. What status do these have? A natural suggestion is to regard all of these as being beliefs. But this view is straightforwardly incompatible with a view on which concepts are the constituents of beliefs and other higher thoughts. It is mereologically impossible both for concepts both be identified with terms in theories and with theories themselves. We would need some other way of talking about the representations that make up beliefs if we choose to regard concepts as simply being miniature theories.

Despite the differences between these two views, the empirical evidence taken to support the Theory-Theory does not generally discriminate between them, nor have psychologists always been careful to mark these distinctions. As with many debates over representational posits, the views in question generate differing predictions only in combination with supplementary assumptions about cognitive processing and resources. However, there may be theoretical reasons for preferring one view over the other; these will be discussed further in section 5.

3. Support for the Theory-Theory

a. Cognitive Development

Much of the support for the Theory-Theory comes from developmental studies. Carey (1985) largely initiated this line of research with her investigations of children’s concepts of animal, living thing, and kindred biological notions. For example, she found that major changes occur in children’s knowledge of bodies and their functioning from four to eleven years old. The youngest children understand eating, breathing, digesting, and so forth, mainly as human behaviors, and they explain them in terms of human needs, desires, plans, and conventions. Over time, children build various new accounts of bodies, initially treating them as simple containers and finally differentiating them into separate organs that have their own biological functions. In Carey’s terms, young children start out seeing behavior as governed by an intuitive psychological theory, out of which an intuitive biology develops (1985, p. 69).

The centrality of humans to young children’s understanding of living things can be seen in several studies. Four and five year olds are reluctant to attribute animal properties—even eating and breathing—to living beings other than humans. When asked to name things that have various properties of living things, children overwhelmingly pick ‘people’ first, followed by mammals, and then a few other scattered types of creatures. The primacy of people in biology carries over to judgments of similarity, with adults displaying a smooth gradient of similarity between people and other living things and six year olds seeing a sharp dividing line between people and the rest of the animal kingdom, including mammals. Finally, in inductive projection tasks people are clearly paradigmatic for four year olds: if told that a person has an organ called a spleen, they will project having a spleen to dogs and bees, but rarely the opposite. By age 10, people are seen as no longer unique in this respect. So young children’s theory of life is focused initially around humans as the paradigm exemplars, and only later becomes generalized as they discover commonalities among all animals and other living things. Indeed, the very concept living thing comes to be acquired as this knowledge develops.

Keil (1989) added to the evidence with many striking results concerning how children’s concepts of natural kinds, nominal kinds, and artifacts develop from kindergarten onwards. He finds compelling evidence for what he initially called a ‘characteristic-to-defining’ shift in conceptual structure. Characteristic features are akin to prototypes: compilations of statistically significant but possibly superficial properties found in categories. Defining features, on the other hand, are those that genuinely make something the kind of thing that it is, regardless of how well it corresponds to the observed characteristics.

In a series of discovery studies, Keil (1989) gave children descriptions of objects that have the characteristic features belonging to a natural kind, but which were later discovered to have the (plausible) defining features of a different kind; for example, an animal that looks and acts like a horse but which is discovered to have the inside parts of cows as well as cow parents and cow babies. While at age five, children thought these things were horses, by age seven they were more likely to think them cows, and adults were nearly certain these were cows. Defining features based on biology (internal structure, parentage) come to dominate characteristic features (appearance, behavior).

In a related series of transformation studies, children heard about a member of a natural kind which underwent some sort of artificial alterations to its appearance, behavior, and insides; for example, a raccoon that was dyed to look like a skunk and operated on so that it produces a foul, skunk-like odor. Five-year olds thought these transformations changed the raccoon into a skunk, while seven year olds were more resistant, and nine year olds were nearly sure that such changes in kind weren’t possible. This effect was notably stronger for biological kinds than mineral kinds; however, children at all ages strongly resisted the idea that a member of a biological kind could be turned into something from a different ontological category (for example, an animal cannot be turned into a plant). Finally, some kinds of transformations are more likely to change a thing’s kind: among five year olds, alterations to internal or developmental features along with permanent surface parts are more effective than temporary surface changes or costumes, and internal changes retain their influence until at least age nine.

In Keil’s view, this shows that children may start out with a comparatively impoverished theory of what makes something a member of a biological kind (or a mineral kind, social kind, or artifact kind), but this theory is enriched and deepened with more causal principles governing origins, growth, internal structure, reproduction, nutrition, and behavior. As this network of causal principles becomes more enriched they recognize that the category members are defined by the presence of these theoretically significant linkages rather than by the more superficial features that initially guided them. ‘Primal theories’ develop into more mature folk theories in different domains according to their own time course.

Finally, Gopnik & Meltzoff (1997) survey a range of domains to argue for the early emergence of theories. To take one example, they argue that children’s understanding of objects and object appearances starts off as highly theoretical and develops in response to new experience until they achieve adult form. Six-month olds, for instance, fail to search for objects that are hidden behind screens, and they show no surprise when an object moves behind a screen, fails to appear at a gap in the middle of the screen, but then appears whole from behind the other side of the screen. These behaviors only emerge at 9 months. Gopnik & Meltzoff explain this change by claiming that the infants come to understand that occlusion makes objects invisible. Until 12 months, however, they continue to make the ‘A-not-B’ error, which involves searching for an object under the first occluder it disappeared behind, rather than the last one. They ascribe this failure to children’s adherence to an auxiliary hypothesis of the form: objects will be where they appeared before. This rule is abandoned when it comes to conflict with the evidence and the child’s developing theory of object behavior. In addition, from ages 12 to 18 months, children begin to systematically play (‘experiment’) with hiding and invisible displacement, suggesting that they are interested in generating evidence about this developing cognitive domain. This in turn strengthens the analogy between cognitive development and active theorizing by adult scientists.

b. Adult Categorization, Inference, and Learning

Murphy & Medin (1985) argued in largely abstract fashion that categorization should be seen as a process of explaining why an exemplar belongs with the rest of a category. A man who jumps into a swimming pool while fully clothed at a party is plausibly drunk, even though these are not features of drunks in general—or they certainly are not stored as such in one’s default drunk concept. Theories and explanatory knowledge are required to focus on the relevant features of categories in a variety of tasks and contexts. Research with adults has tended to support this perspective.

One significant piece of evidence that comports with the general Theory-Theory perspective is the causal status effect (Ahn & Kim, 2000). The effect is the tendency of participants to privilege causally deeper or more central properties in a range of tasks including categorization and similarity judgment. For example, if people are taught about a person who has a cough caused by a certain kind of virus, and then given two other descriptions, one which matches in the cause (same virus) but not the effect (runny nose), and another that matches in the effect (cough) but not the cause (different virus), common causal features make exemplars more similar. Matching causal features can even override other shared features in categorization. If taught about an example with a cause that produces two effect features and two other examples, one of which shares the cause only and the other of which shares both effects, a majority of participants group the common cause exemplar with the original, even though they differ in most features.

Murphy (2002) reviews an extensive body of evidence showing that background knowledge has a pervasive effect on category learning, categorization, and induction. To take two examples, consider artificial category learning and category construction. In learning studies, participants are given two categories that are distinguished by different lists of features. The features that describe a more ‘coherent’ category in which the features are very plausibly related to each other (for example, ‘Made in Norway, heavily insulated, white, drives on glaciers, has treads’) were played against those that describe a more ‘neutral’ category. Participants found the coherent categories much easier to learn, and retained more information about them. Similarly, if given the ability to freely sort these items into categories they tended to group the coherent category members together even when they shared only a single feature. Background knowledge concerning the likely relationships among these features plays an essential role in learning and categorizing, even when it is not explicitly brought up in the experiment itself. This further undermines the prototype theory’s account of learning as a process of atheoretical tabulation of correlations.

4. Relations to Other Views

a. Relations to Essentialism

The Theory-Theory is closely related to psychological essentialism (henceforth just ‘essentialism’), the claim that people tend to represent categories as if they possessed hidden, non-obvious properties that make them the sorts of things that they are and that causally produce or constrain their observable properties (Medin & Ortony, 1989). These essences need not be actually known, but may be believed to exist even in the absence of detailed information about them. Concepts may include either conjectures as to what their essential properties might be, or else blank ‘essence placeholders’ that govern in the absence of these as-yet-unknown essential properties. Commitment to essences may be viewed as a kind of theoretical commitment, insofar as essences are causally potent but unobserved properties that structure and explain observable properties of categories. More generally, it is the commitment to there being a certain kind of causal structure underlying the categories we commonly represent.

There is a large body of evidence that supports the psychological essentialist hypothesis (Gelman, 2003, 2004; see Strevens, 2000 for criticism). For example, children’s inductions are governed by more than superficial resemblances among objects. In a standard inductive projection paradigm, participants are presented with a triad of pictures of objects only two of which perceptually resemble each other (for example, a leaf, a leaf-shaped insect, and a small black insect) and two of which share a verbal label (for example, both insects, while dissimilar, are called ‘bugs’, and the leaf is called a ‘leaf’). They are then told that one object of the resembling pair has a certain property and asked to project the property to the third object. By 30 months, children will project properties on the basis of labeled category membership rather than similarity. This effect does not depend on the precise repetition of the verbal label (that is, synonyms work just as well), and it tends to be more powerful in natural biological kinds than in artifacts. Even among 16- to 21-month olds one can find similar effects: behaviors displayed with one sort of toy animal (barking, chewing on a bone, and so forth.) will be imitated with a perceptually dissimilar animal if they are given a matching label. This suggests that induction is not entirely governed by superficial properties even among very young children.

Children may entertain more specific hypotheses about what the underlying category essences are as well. In Keil’s transformation studies, some participants, when debriefed, maintained that parentage was important to determining kind membership. In a number of studies, Gelman and her collaborators (see, for example, Gelman & Wellman, 1991) have shown that among four to five year olds, insides have a special theoretical role to play. Children can distinguish similar-appearing objects (pigs and piggy banks) from those that have similar insides, and they judge that removing a creature’s insides both removes its category-typical behaviors and also makes it no longer the same kind of thing. Removing outsides or changing a transitory property has little effect on membership or function.

These studies provide further evidence that the Original Sim has at best a weak grip on young children. Moreover, they reinforce the claim that categorization can sometimes be dominated by an early-emerging understanding of biology that treats stereotypical properties as non-dispositive. Gelman’s own robust psychological essentialism includes further claims such as that category boundaries are invariably taken to be sharp rather than fuzzy, and that essences invariably focus on purely internal properties. Whatever the status of these additional claims, the broader moral of the essentialism literature is in line with the proposals made by Theory theorists. Children come prepared to learn about deeper causal relations in many domains and they readily treat these relations as important in categorizing and making inductions.

b. Relations to Causal Modeling Approaches

In recent years much attention has focused on the role of causality in cognition, and consequently theories of cognitive performance that emphasize causal modeling have gained prominence. The idea that concepts might be identified (at least in part) with causal models has grown out of this tradition.

The theory of causal models is a formally well-developed and quantitatively precise way of describing probabilistic and causal dependency information, particularly in graphical form (for accessible introductions, see Gopnik & Shulz, 2007; Glymour, 2001; Sloman, 2005). Briefly, a causal model of a category depicts part of the relevant causal information about how things in the domain are produced, organized, and function. A causal model of a bird notes that it has wings, a body, and feathers, but also encodes the fact that those features causally contribute to its being able to fly; a causal model of a car depicts the fact that it is drivable in virtue of having wheels and an engine, that it can transport people because it is drivable, and that it makes noise because of its engine. These structures can be represented as sets of features connected by arrows, which indicate when the presence of one property causes or sustains (and therefore makes more probable) the presence of another. These directed causal graphs provide one possible representational format for concepts.

For example, Chaigneau, Barsalou, & Sloman (2004) have proposed the H I P E theory of artifact categorization, which states that artifacts are grouped according to their Historical role, the Intentions of the agents that use them, their Physical structure, and the Events in which they participate. On H I P E, artifact concepts are miniature causal models of the relations among these properties, all of which may potentially contribute to making something the kind of artifact that it is. Similar sorts of models could be developed for natural kind concepts. Indeed, essentialism itself is one form that a causal model can take: the essence is the ‘core’ of the concept, and it causally produces the more superficial features. Causal model theory is a generalization of this idea that allows these graphs to take many different forms.

Causal model theory is best seen as one form that the Theory-Theory can take (Gopnik & Schulz, 2004; Rehder, 2003). It shares that view’s commitment to causal-explanatory structure being central to concepts. While it is tied to a more specific hypothesis about representation than Theory-Theory in general (the formalism of directed causal graphs), this is also a strength, since these models are part of a well-developed framework for learning and processing. Causal model theory gives the Theory-Theory the resources to develop more wide-ranging and detailed empirical predictions concerning categorization, induction, and naming.

It is also worth noting that causal model theory may give the concepts as theories view the resources to answer the mereological objection it faces. The components of causal models can be seen as features representing properties, connected by links representing causal relations. Many models of concepts take them to be complex structures composed of features in this way. If we see causal models as miniature theories, then we can view concepts as theories if we identify them with such models. Adopting this approach eliminates any potential problems about concepts being both the constituents of beliefs and also being composed of beliefs.

5. Objections to the Theory-Theory

a. Holism

The holism objection focuses on the fact that the individuation conditions for concepts are closely tied to those for theories. They are holistic, meaning that a concept’s identity depends on its relations to a large set of other representational states. This position is suggested by Murphy & Medin’s comment that “[i]n order to characterize knowledge about and use of a concept, we must include all of the relations involving that concept and the other concepts that depend on it” (1985, p. 297). This gives rise to problems concerning the stability of concepts. The objection may be put as follows. Suppose concepts are identified by their relation to theories. Then changes in theories entail changes in concepts: if C₁,…,C_n are constituted by their relation to T₁, and T₁ changes into T₂, then at least some of C₁,…,C_n will have to change as well, so long as the changes in the theories occurs in the parts that contribute to individuating those concepts. And it is part of the developmental and dynamical account of the Theory-Theory that such transitions in theories take place. So according to the Theory-Theory, concepts are unstable; they change over time, so that one does not have the same concepts before a revision in theory that one has afterwards.

The conclusion is particularly objectionable if one assumes that there will be many changes to theories, so that concepts also change frequently. But there are reasons to want concepts to be more stable than this. First, one wants to be able to compare concepts across individuals with different theories. A young child may not have the fully developed life concept, but she and I can still have many common beliefs about particular living things and their behavior, even if she does not represent them as being alive in the way that I do (that is, even if her understanding of life is impoverished relative to mine). Second, the rationality of theory change itself depends on some intertheoretic stability of concepts: Rejecting theory T₁ may involve coming to believe that belief B formulated using T₁’s concepts is false. So now that I believe T_2, I reject B. But if changing from T₁ to T₂ involves changing the concepts involved in B, I can no longer even formulate that belief, since I now lack the required conceptual resources. So we are at a loss to describe the rational nature of the transition between theories.

What this suggests is that belief attributions are often stable across theory changes; or at least, not every change in one’s background theory should change many or all of one’s concepts (and hence beliefs). Some sort of independence from belief is required. The problem is that concepts are individuated by their roles, which in turn are determined by the causal, inferential, and evidential roles of the propositions that contain them, and these are precisely what change as theories do (Fodor, 1994; Margolis, 1995).

This problem faces both the strong concepts in theories view and the concepts as theories view, but the weak concepts in theories view is immune to it, since it allows that concepts may participate in theories without being individuated by them. Two responses to the holism objection are typical. First, some Theory theorists (for example, Gopnik & Meltzoff, 1997) have embraced it. It is, they suggest, not implausible that young children are to a certain degree incomprehensible to adults, as would be predicted if their world view is incommensurable with ours (Carey, 2009, p. 378). Second, others have attempted to avoid this conclusion by distinguishing respects in which concepts may change (such as narrow content or internal conceptual role) and respects in which they may remain stable (such as wide content or reference). This dual-factor approach is also adopted by Carey (2009). The unstable respects are those that differ with background theories, while the stable respects provide continuity so that concepts can be identified across changes and differences in view. The success of this approach depends on whether the stable respects can do the relevant explanatory work needed in psychological explanation and communication.

b. Compositionality

A representational system is compositional if the properties of complex symbols are completely determined by the properties of the simpler symbols that make them up, plus the properties of their mode of combination. So predicate logic is compositional, since the semantic value of ‘Fa’ is determined by the semantic values of the predicate ‘F’ and the individual constant ‘a’. Similarly ‘Fa & Fb’ is semantically determined as a function of ‘Fa’, ‘Fb’, and the interpretation of conjunction. Many have argued that thought is compositional as well (Fodor, 1998), which entails that the properties of complex concepts derive wholly from the properties of their constituents.

If thought is compositional, and concepts are the constituents of thoughts, then whatever concepts are must also be compositional. So if concepts are (or are individuated by) theories, then theories must similarly be compositional. However, there are good reasons to think that theories are not compositional. A standard example is the concept of pet fish. The fish might come from the theory of folk biology, while pet might derive from a theory of human social behavior (since keeping pets is a sociocultural fact about humans). If the strong concepts in theories view is right, their content is determined by their inferential role in each of these theories. But pet fish has a novel inferential role that is not obviously predictable from those roles taken individually. Instances of pet fish, for example, are typically thought to live in bowls and feed on flakes, neither of which is true of pets or fish in general. This information is not derived from one’s ‘pet theory’ or ‘fish theory’. It is therefore not compositional. The same point can be made about the concepts as theories view. If one’s causal models of pets and fish do not somehow encode this information in the features that make them up, then it cannot be derived compositionally by putting them together. Since examples like this can be multiplied indefinitely, the Theory-Theory cannot account for the general compositionality of thought.

While many psychologists have simply ignored these concerns, several responses are possible. Here are two. First, one can divide concepts into two components, a stable compositional element and a non-compositional element (Rips, 1995). The compositional element might be thought of just as a simple label, while the non-compositional element includes theoretical and prototypical information. One part has the job of accounting for concept combination, the other has the job of accounting for categorization and inductive inference. Second, one can try to weaken the compositionality requirement. Perhaps concepts are required only to be compositional in principle, not in practice; or else compositionality might be viewed as a fallback strategy to be employed when there is no other information available about the extension of a complex concept (Prinz, 2002; Robbins, 2002). Whichever approach one takes, the compositionality objection highlights the fact that while the Theory-Theory has impressive resources for explaining facts about development and concept deployment, concept combination is more challenging to account for.

c. Scope

The scope objection is one that faces nearly every theory of concepts. In general, where such a theory proposes an identification of the form ‘concepts are K’, where ‘K’ is a kind of mental structure or capacity, the question can be raised: are all concepts like this? Or are there cases where someone might possess the relevant concept but not possess K? For instance, if concepts are prototypes, then there must be the right sort of prototype for every concept we can use in thought. A theory has satisfactory scope if there exists the right sort of K for every concept that we are capable of entertaining.

For the Theory-Theory, the problem seems to be that there are too few theories. We have concepts such as car, computer, gin, lemur, and nightstick. Perhaps for some of these we have theories, at least of a highly sketchy nature. But it is less clear that we have these for other concepts. One might have the concept higgs boson (from reading newspaper articles about the Large Hadron Collider) but have essentially no interesting knowledge of the Standard Model of particle physics. One might have the concept true but not have a theory of truth. One might have the concept billiards but know nothing of the game’s rules or conventions (‘that game they play in the UK that resembles pool’). If the Theory-Theory identifies each concept with a domain-specific theory, these scope challenges are serious. Denying that we have these concepts in virtue of lacking the relevant knowledge is unappealing.

One possible response is to restrict the scope of the Theory-Theory itself. Carey (1985) takes this tack. She does not think that every concept must be associated with a proprietary theory. Rather, concepts are embedded in relatively large scale theories of whole cognitive domains: “there are only a relatively few conceptual structures that embody deep explanatory notions—on the order of a dozen or so in the case of educated nonscientists. These conceptual structures correspond to domains that might be the disciplines in a university: psychology, mechanics, a theory of matter, economics, religion, government, biology, history, and so forth.” (Carey, 1985, p. 201). This approach, favored by other domain theorists, gives this version of the concepts in theories view a slight advantage over the concepts as theories view, since the latter is more clearly vulnerable to the scope objection. A defender of the concepts as theories view might fall back to the position that even very sketchy or minimal understanding of the causal principles at work in a category can count as a theory, as, even in these cases, we meet the minimal concept possession conditions, and our understanding is often equally superficial (Rozenblit & Keil, 2002).

d. Disanalogies Between Development and Science

The Theory-Theory relies heavily on the notion that what children do in constructing their knowledge of the world is quite literally like what scientists do in producing, testing, and revising the theories that constitute scientific knowledge. This implies that there is substantial cognitive continuity across development, so that infants and young children, along with older children and adults, employ the same theory-construction mechanisms that operate on prior theoretical representations plus new evidence to produce revised and, with luck, improved theories.

Many have challenged this picture on the grounds that what children do is not in fact sufficiently similar to what scientists do for them to be seen as instances of the same cognitive or epistemic process. These complaints are summarized by Faucher, Mallon, Nazer, Nichols, Ruby, Stich, & Weinberg (2002). They argue that scientific theory revision is a process that is inseparable from a host of cultural factors. For example, there are norms governing how one ought to gather and weigh evidence, as well as how one should revise one’s beliefs, and these govern the practice of science differently across times and cultures. Moreover, theories are usually socially transmitted (in the classroom, the lab, and in less formal contexts) along with these norms. So in science, society and mind interpenetrate in such a way that individual cognition needs to be receptive to external sources of authority, both with respect to theoretical knowledge and epistemic norms. The simple picture of theory revision as involving only initial theories and evidence should be rejected.

There are at least two possible responses to this anti-individualistic argument. One is to argue that while these social factors play a role in adult science, the essential core of scientific practice remains the adjustment of theories under the influence of evidence. Normative factors can eventually come to help us perform these tasks better or in ways that fit in more productively with the surrounding culture, but the basic mechanism of evidence-based revision must be present in any case. And the evidence suggests that it is operative even before these social factors have an effect. A second response would be to argue that this picture is in fact a correct and welcome revision to the overly simplistic view originally proposed by Theory theorists. We should expect there to be substantial cultural influences on children’s cognition, and some of the cross-cultural studies cited by Faucher et al. provide evidence in favor of this hypothesis. So we should enrich the Theory-Theory view of children’s early cognition, not abandon it entirely.

6. Conclusions

The Theory-Theory consists of many interrelated claims about concept individuation, structure, development, and processing. The claim that development of concepts and domain knowledge in children is driven by causal-explanatory expectations, perhaps of an essentialist sort, has been most extensively investigated. While there are some attempts to explain these data by appeal to empiricist principles (Smith, Jones, & Landau, 1996), the Theory-Theory has strong support here. Studies with adults also suggest that causal information is often important to categorization. The behavior of both adults and children has been characterized using the framework of causal models, enabling Theory theorists to frame their view in a formally precise way. Many of the assumptions that trouble the account, such as the strong concepts in theories view that generates the problems of holism and incommensurability, turn out not to be essential to its empirical success. The greatest problem the view faces may be one of scope, but this challenge is arguably faced by all other theories of concepts currently in contention (Machery, 2009; Weiskopf, 2009). Whether or not a thoroughgoing Theory-Theory perspective is ultimately vindicated, its key insights will have to be incorporated by any future comprehensive theory of concepts.

7. References and Further Reading

Ahn, W., & Kim, N. S. (2000). “The causal status effect in categorization: An overview.” In D. L. Medin (Ed.), Psychology of Learning and Motivation, Vol. 40 (pp. 23-65). New York: Academic Press.
Carey, S. (1985). Conceptual Change in Childhood. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Carey, S. (1991). “Knowledge acquisition: enrichment or conceptual change?” In S. Carey & R. Gelman (Eds.), The Epigenesis of Mind (pp. 257-291). Hillsdale, N J: Erlbaum.
Carey, S. (2009). The Origin of Concepts. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Chaigneau, S.E., Barsalou, L.W., & Sloman, S. (2004). “Assessing the causal structure of function.” Journal of Experimental Psychology: General, 133, 601-625.
Faucher, L., Mallon, R., Nazer, D., Nichols, S., Ruby, A., Stich, S., & Weinberg, J. (2002). “The baby in the labcoat: Why child development is an inadequate model for understanding the development of science.” In P. Carruthers, S. Stich & M. Siegal (Eds.), The Cognitive Basis of Science (pp. 335-362). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Fodor, J. (1994). “Concepts: A potboiler.” Cognition, 50, 95-113.
Fodor, J. (1998). Concepts. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Gelman, R., & Baillargeon, R. (1983). “A review of some Piagetian concepts.” In J. H. Flavell and E. Markman (Eds.), Cognitive Development: Vol. 3 (pp. 167-230). New York: Wiley.
Gelman, S. (2003). The Essential Child. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Gelman, S. (2004). “Psychological essentialism in children.” Trends in Cognitive Sciences, 8, 404-409.
Gelman, S., & Wellman, H. (1991). “Insides and essences: Early understandings of the nonobvious.” Cognition, 38, 213-244.
Glymour, C. (2001). The Mind’s Arrows. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Gopnik, A. (1988). “Conceptual and semantic development as theory change.” Mind and Language, 3, 197-217.
Gopnik, A. (1996). “The scientist as child.” Philosophy of Science, 63, 485-514.
Gopnik, A., & Meltzoff, A. (1997). Words, Thoughts, and Theories. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Gopnik, A., & Schulz, L. (2004). “Mechanisms of theory-formation in young children.” Trends in Cognitive Science, 8, 371-377.
Gopnik, A., & Schulz, L. (Eds.) (2007). Causal Learning. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Hampton, J. A. (1995). “Similarity-based categorization: The development of prototype theory.” Psychologica Belgica, 35, 103-125.
Keil, F. C. (1989). Concepts, Kinds, and Cognitive Development. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Machery, E. (2009). Doing Without Concepts. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Margolis, E. (1995). “What is conceptual glue?” Minds and Machines, 9, 241-255.
Margolis, E. (1999). “The significance of the theory analogy in the psychological study of concepts.” Mind and Language, 10, 45-71.
Medin, D., & Ortony, A. (1989). “Psychological essentialism.” In S. Vosniadou & A. Ortony (Eds.), Similarity and Analogical Reasoning (pp. 179-195). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Morton, A. (1980). Frames of Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Murphy, G. (2002). The Big Book of Concepts. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Murphy, G., & Medin, D. (1985). “The role of theories in conceptual coherence.” Psychological Review, 92, 289-316
Medin, D., & Wattenmaker. (1987). “Category cohesiveness, theories, and cognitive archeology.” In U. Neisser (Ed.), Concepts and Conceptual Development (pp. 25-63). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Premack, D., & Woodruff, G. (1978). “Does the chimpanzee have a theory of mind?” Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 1, 515-526.
Prinz, J. (2002). Furnishing the Mind. Cambridge: M I T Press.
Quine, W. V. (1977). “Natural kinds.” In S. Schwartz (Ed.), Naming, Necessity, and Natural Kinds (pp. 155-175). Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Redher, B. (2003). “A causal-model theory of conceptual representation and categorization.” Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition, 29, 1141-59.
Rips, L. (1995). “The current status of research on concept combination.” Mind and Language, 10, 72-104.
Robbins, P. (2002). “How to blunt the sword of compositionality.” Nous, 36, 313-334.
Rosch, E. (1977). “Human categorization.” In N. Warren (Ed.), Advances in Cross-Cultural Psychology: Vol. 1 (pp. 1-49). London: Academic Press.
Rosch, E., & Mervis, C. (1975). “Family resemblances: Studies in the internal structure of categories.” Cognitive Psychology, 7, 573-605.
Rozenblit, L., & Keil, F. (2002). “The misunderstood limits of folk science: An illusion of explanatory depth.” Cognitive Science, 26, 521-562.
Sloman, S. (2005). Causal Models. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Smith, E. E., & Medin, D. (1981). Concepts and Categories. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Smith, L., Jones, S., & Landau, B. (1996). “Naming in young children: A dumb attentional mechanism?” Cognition, 60, 143-171.
Strevens, M. (2000). “The essentialist aspect of native theories.” Cognition, 74, 149-175.
Weiskopf, D. (2009). “The plurality of concepts.” Synthese, 169, 145-173.
Wellman, H., & Gelman, S. (1988). “Cognitive development: Foundational theories of core domains.” Annual Review of Psychology, 43, 337-375.

Author Information

Daniel A. Weiskopf
Email: dweiskopf@gsu.edu
Georgia State University
U. S. A.

Lucian Blaga (1895—1961)

Lucian Blaga was a prominent philosopher in Eastern Europe during the period between the two world wars. Trained in both Eastern Orthodox theology and classical philosophy, he developed a “speculative” philosophy that includes books on epistemology, metaphysics, aesthetics, philosophy of culture, philosophical anthropology, philosophy of history, philosophy of science, and philosophy of religion. A chair in philosophy of culture was created for him at the University of Cluj, a leading Romanian university of the period, now Babes-Bolyai University.

Unfortunately, the height of Blaga’s career coincided with WWII, after which Romania was occupied by Soviet troops that installed a socialist government. The new government removed Blaga and many other professors from their university posts. Although Blaga was forbidden to teach and publish, he continued to study and write. Eventually thirty-four of his books of philosophy were published. At the heart of his philosophical publications are four trilogies that constitute a systematic philosophy, a feat that has rarely been attempted since Hegel. He also published books of poetry and theater, plus one novel.

Today Blaga is a national figure in Romania, but because of the unfortunate circumstances surrounding his career, he is barely known to the outside world. However, because of his creativity and systematic vision, his work is being actively studied in Europe in the 21^st century. There are those who argue that this mid-20^th century philosopher can make valuable contributions to issues that philosophers are still struggling with today.

This article begins by explaining Blaga’s intellectual formation, which provides a context for understanding his philosophy. It then introduces the main features of his philosophical system and provides a bibliography of primary and secondary sources for further study.

Biographical Sketch
Philosophy of Philosophy
Epistemology
Metaphysics
Other Philosophical Issues
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources in English

1. Biographical Sketch

Lucian Blaga (1895-1961) was the son of a village priest. The village was Lancram, an ethnically Romanian village on the eastern edge of the Austro-Hungarian Empire. The priest was Isidor Blaga, an avid reader who seems to have enjoyed studying German philosophy as much as Orthodox theology. Isidor only reluctantly accepted the priestly vacancy in Lancram that was created by the premature death of his own father. A lack of finances to continue his education made this choice a necessity, but the priestly vocation was not Isidor’s original goal: he seems to have harbored more academic aspirations. His interest in higher learning, his interest in philosophy and his personal library would leave a profound imprint on his youngest son.

Life in the Romanian village too left a profound imprint on Blaga. A Romanian village of the late nineteenth and early twentieth century was essentially unaltered from medieval times. There was no industry and little mechanization to speak of. The economy was agricultural. The only schooling was a one-room primary school. Yet, a wealth of traditional wisdom preserved in legends, ballads, poems, and perhaps especially the multitude of proverbs and aphorisms that Lucian Blaga later collected and published in several volumes, provided its own kind of philosophical insight. The culture of the Romanian village would be the subject of Blaga’s acceptance speech given at his induction into the Romanian Academy in 1936.

Because of the dismal academics of the village elementary school and the complete lack of a high school, Isidor and his wife, Ana, sacrificed to send Lucian to private boarding schools. The urban centers in Transylvania were either Hungarian or German, and as a result the best educational opportunities were in Hungarian or German schools. The first school that Blaga attended was a German boarding school in the nearby town of Sebes. Here he studied in German and read important German thinkers. Blaga next enrolled in the prestigious Andrei Saguna High School in the city of Brasov where he studied German, Hungarian, Latin, and Greek. He was particularly interested in the natural sciences, the philosophy of science, and also world religions. A senior thesis was required for graduation from Andrei Saguna: Blaga’s was on Einstein’s relativity and Poincare’s non-Euclidean geometry.

Blaga intended to enroll in a German university upon graduation, but the onset of WWI prevented this. He took the only option open to him besides military service: he enrolled in the Romanian Orthodox seminary in Sibiu, another Transylvanian city. Although he neither enjoyed nor excelled at the more pastoral aspects of the seminary curriculum, he surpassed his classmates in the theoretical areas of study. During this period he especially increased his understanding of philosophy of religion and the history of art.

Blaga completed his undergraduate degree in 1917 and enrolled in the PhD program in philosophy at the University of Vienna. During this time he published his first two books, a book of poetry and a book of aphorisms, which sold well in Romania and helped him finance his studies. He successfully defended his dissertation in November of 1920. It was titled Kultur und Erkenntnis (Culture and Knowledge).

Blaga’s life experiences growing up in a multicultural region (Transylvania was populated by Romanians, Hungarians, Germans, Gypsies, and several smaller minority groups); experiencing the contrast between the peasant village and the modern city; and studying Eastern Orthodox theology and liturgy side by side with European philosophy, history, and science spawned in him a philosophical outlook that gives prominent place to philosophy of culture. Within the broad framework of culture Blaga finds places for science, art, history, and religion.

Blaga’s philosophical system interacts with the theories of classical and contemporary philosophers and intellectuals. These range from the pre-Socratics through early twentieth century philosophers like William James, Edmund Husserl, and Henri Bergson, and also intellectuals such as Albert Einstein, Sigmund Freud, and Paul Tillich. The influence of Plotinus, Kant, and the German Romantics is clearly evident. But Blaga’s philosophy is not merely an attempt to synthesize the insights of other thinkers. It is a systematic and integrated attempt to address the issues that occupied the leading minds of his day.

Blaga’s early philosophical career involved research and publication rather than teaching. He published many articles and a number of books, and served as an editor for several literary magazines. His publications range from fiction to philosophy. His first book of philosophy, Filosofia stilului (The Philosophy of Style), was published in 1924. He also served his country as a statesman. In 1936 he was inducted into the Romanian Academy (a prestigious research institution). Finally in 1938 a special chair of philosophy of culture was created in his honor at the University of Cluj, a leading Romanian university in Transylvania. His inaugural essay was titled Despre plenitudinea istorica (Concerning Historical Fullness). He taught at the University of Cluj until 1949, when he was removed from his post by the newly installed Socialist government of Romania. After this he was not permitted to teach and was only permitted to publish under strict supervision. After his death in 1961 a number of his works were permitted to be posthumously published, and since the fall of Romanian communism Blaga’s entire oeuvre has been republished.

2. Philosophy of Philosophy

Some philosophers philosophize about a range of topics without ever turning their analytic skills to an analysis of philosophy itself. In contrast to this, Blaga begins his systematic philosophy with an entire book dedicated to a critical discussion of philosophy. The title of this book is Despre constiinta filosofica (Concerning Philosophical Consciousness). It describes philosophy as a creative and constructive attempt to understand reality. Therefore Blaga views the construction of a systematic metaphysics as the pinnacle of the philosophical enterprise.

At the same time, Blaga rejects the notion that a philosophical system can ever provide an ultimate analysis of reality. All philosophical systems are creative interpretations that attempt to express reality symbolically through human language. But despite this apparent futility inherent in the philosophical task, Blaga views the attempt to “reveal” ultimate reality as the activity that brings humans closest to fulfillment.

The philosophical method is characterized by the utilization of logic and the attempt at objectivity, but subjectivity and style also have their place. Blaga elucidates the proper function of each. He argues that every philosophical system has a central thesis that orients the system. He names the orientation that this point provides the “transcendental accent.” This accent is an expression of the style of the philosopher who created it. For example, the knowledge of the Ideals, which serves as the transcendental accent in Plato’s philosophy, seems to reflect Plato’s own expansive personality and his drive to understand the many disparate aspects of his world.

It is not only the individual who is affected by controlling themes: such beliefs affect entire cultures. Sometimes these themes enter the public subconscious and are called “common sense.” Blaga recognizes that common sense beliefs often preserve wisdom based upon a wealth of experiences, but also warns that they sometimes preserve the prejudices and mistakes of previous generations. He then makes an important and controversial observation about the relationship of philosophy to common sense: whereas many Anglo-American philosophers have taken it upon themselves to defend common sense, Blaga argues that a philosopher must shun the conformist impulse underlying belief in common sense. A philosopher sometimes needs to attack common sense beliefs in order to open up a space for greater understanding.

This position vis-à-vis common sense could be taken as an indication that Blaga views philosophy as a realist rather than a constructivist attempt to understand reality. This would be at least partially mistaken, however. Blaga views philosophy as a creative activity that is justified even when its results are mistaken, since it deepens and enriches the understanding of the problematic of the human spirit. Thus philosophical speculation is justified quite apart from the truthfulness of its theories. Philosophy is justified by its fruitfulness, vision, suggestiveness, foresight, and how it stirs the soul, even if its theories never attain complete perfection.

This seems to suggest that philosophy is closer to art than to science, a view that would displease many analytic philosophers. Blaga finds both differences and similarities between philosophy and science. The primary difference between philosophy and science is methodological. Both begin with a set of objective data (the aria) and with certain presuppositions about how the data will be handled (the interior horizon of the problem). But while the data of science is very specific and the presuppositions are detailed and complex, the data of philosophy includes all of human experience and the presuppositions are very general. Because of this, a scientific investigation is very closely controlled by its initial data and its presuppositions; while philosophical investigation is open to many creative solutions that the scientist would not consider. Initially this might seem like a disadvantage, since it seems like an admission of the undisciplined nature of philosophical investigation in comparison to the fairly rigid discipline of the natural sciences. However, it also has a significant strength: Blaga points out that because of the very specific aria and interior horizon of a scientific investigation, science methodologically anticipates its solutions much more than philosophy does. Hence philosophy is more open to discovering the unexpected.

3. Epistemology

This discussion of the difference between philosophy and science draws on several ideas that Blaga elaborates in his epistemology. His primary works on this subject are the three books that comprise his “Trilogy of Knowledge”: Eonul dogmatic (The Dogmatic Age), Cunoasterea luciferica (Luciferic Cognition), and Cenzura transcendenta (Transcendent Censorship). These books analyze, with surprising lucidity, the entire range of modes of human cognition.

Blaga analyzes cognition into seven possible modes:

Positive-adequate cognition
Quasi-cognition
Negative cognition
Cognition that is part positive-adequate and part quasi-cognition
Cognition that is part positive-adequate and part negative cognition
Cognition that is part positive-adequate and part quasi-cognition and part negative cognition
Cognition that is part quasi-cognition and part negative cognition

He discusses each of these modes of cognition, but only the second and the seventh are actually realized by humans. The second, quasi-cognition, can be further analyzed into concrete cognition, paradisaic cognition, mythic cognition, and occult cognition. The seventh, which Blaga names “luciferic cognition,” can be analyzed into three subdivisions: plus-cognition, zero-cognition, and minus-cognition. His discussion of the subdivisions of luciferic cognition, which is the subject of his book by that name, is perhaps the most original and most interesting part of his epistemology.

Blaga remarks that the possible forms of cognition can be analyzed into three types: (1) cognition that is positive-adequate and unlimited, (2) cognition that is censured but in principle unlimited, and (3) cognition that is positive-adequate but strictly limited. The first type would pertain only to a deity. The third type pertains to simple organisms and enables them to perform functions such as the replication of lost appendages. Human cognition falls within the second type, since human cognition is potentially unlimited in extent but strictly limited qualitatively, because it never completely captures its object and never perfectly corresponds to reality.

Mystery, and the cognitive limits that produce mystery, are central to Blaga’s epistemology (and perhaps to his whole philosophy). The reason for these limits is explained in his metaphysics, and the means are explained in his philosophy of culture.

There are at least five important features of Blaga’s epistemology that are innovative, to a greater or lesser degree, and that are significant epistemological contributions. The first of these is the placing of his epistemology within a complementary and explicatory metaphysical system, which will be discussed presently. This metaphysical speculation provides answers to such epistemologically relevant questions as: what are the material, efficient, and final causes of the human epistemological situation; why this situation pertains; how it was implemented; and how it is preserved. A second important feature is Blaga’s emphasis on the important role played in human cognition by culture. According to Blaga, even categories of understanding are culturally affected. He argues that there are both subjective and beautifully creative aspects of human cognition, and also that human cognition is not thwarted by its historicity but is rather empowered by it.

The third and fourth important contributions of Blaga’s epistemology are his analysis of the two types of cognition that he calls “luciferic cognition” and “minus-cognition.” Minus-cognition is a subset of luciferic cognition. Blaga devoted an entire book of his epistemological trilogy to minus-cognition, and another is largely devoted to luciferic cognition. In his elucidation of these two types of cognition, Blaga uncovers methods of problem solving that have heretofore been largely overlooked in Western epistemology.

A fifth important aspect of Blaga’s epistemology is its constructivism. Constructivism, the view that knowledge is a human construct, is a ubiquitous element of Blaga’s philosophy. It was seen in the previous elaboration of Blaga’s philosophy of philosophy, it is reflected in his epistemology, it will be seen in his freely creative metaphysics, and it can also be seen in his philosophy of culture and philosophy of religion.

There have been numerous other constructivist philosophers, ranging from Kant through Nietzsche to 20^th century figures such as Jean Piaget and Ernst van Glasersfeld. Nonetheless, there are several important things about Blaga’s constructivism that make it particularly noteworthy. The first of these is how neatly and consistently constructivism fits within the larger philosophical picture that Blaga paints. His philosophical system gives constructivism a context, an explanation and a purpose that are sometimes lacking in other constructivist philosophies. A second noteworthy aspect of his constructivism is that it is argued for in a wide variety of cognitive contexts: Blaga shows that human thought is constructivist whether it occurs in math, the natural sciences, philosophy, theology, the arts, or in any other cognitive context. A third important aspect is how his constructivism is argued: he does not cease being a constructivist when he argues for his own philosophical system. He views his own system as merely a possible thesis supported (but not proved) by evidence and pragmatic utility.

More should be said about luciferic cognition, since this is one of the key insights of Blaga’s epistemology. Paradisaic cognition (what could be considered “ordinary cognition”) attempts to quantitatively reduce the mysteries of existence. Its progress is linear, adding new facts to the existent body of knowledge. Luciferic cognition, on the other hand, seeks to qualitatively reduce mystery through attenuation or, if that is not possible, through permanentization or intensification of the mysterious. Its progress is inward, deepening and intensifying knowledge of the hidden essence of the cognitive object. Every step of progress leads to another step, ad infinitum, and thus luciferic cognition is never totally successful in grasping its object, but it is successful in providing new understanding of the layers and aspects of the mystery of its being. Luciferic cognition does not exceed the inherent limits of human cognition, but it does explore those limits and press cognition to its fullest extent.

Luciferic cognition is dependent on paradisaic cognition for its starting point, the empirical, conceptual, or imaginary data that Blaga calls “phanic material.” It then “provokes a crisis” in the phanic material through bringing out the mysteries inherent in the object. Whereas paradisaic cognition views objects of cognition as “given,” luciferic cognition views them as partly given, but also partly hidden. Whereas paradisaic cognition is subject to the “illusion of adequacy”—the mistaken belief that the object is as it is perceived to be or, more precisely, the mistaken belief that paradisaic cognition is able to grasp the object as it really is—luciferic cognition begins with the removal of this illusion. An investigation that stops at the mere defining of an object as it is “given” overlooks potentially multitudinous other facets of knowledge about the object.

The distinction between the object of paradisaic cognition and the object of luciferic cognition bears a resemblance to Kant’s phenomena-noumena distinction, but has several important differences. One significant difference is that the Kantian noumenon is an object that is one single mystery; the luciferic object is a long series of latent mysteries. An even more important difference is that whereas the Kantian noumenon is not available to human cognition, Blaga’s luciferic objects are available to luciferic cognition (but are not cognized in the same way as objects are cognized in paradisaic cognition).

Blaga’s analysis of the process of luciferic cognition is fairly detailed and very interesting. It includes ideas that mirror more recent developments in the philosophy of science, such as his concepts of “theory idea,” “directed observation,” “categorical dislocation,” and “Copernican inversion of the object.” His concept of “theory capacity” resembles ideas suggested by American Pragmatists.

Blaga weighs in on the issues of truth and verification, which have largely dominated discussions in recent analytic epistemology. He accepts coherence as a necessary but not sufficient condition of truthfulness, and demonstration of correspondence as a sufficient but not necessary condition. He suggests that the best way to verify the truthfulness of a theory is pragmatic: put it into practice. His own philosophy is consistent with these views: it is a cohesive system, but he does not appeal to this cohesiveness as the grounds for believing it true. Rather he appeals to its ability to facilitate the resolution of philosophical problems.

4. Metaphysics

Blaga’s metaphysic is contained in the three books that form his “Cosmological Trilogy”: Diferentialele divine, (Divine Differentials), Aspecte anthropologice (Anthropological Aspects), and Fiinta istorica (The Historical Being). It is centered on a cosmology that is specifically intended to complement his epistemology. It is sometimes characterized as a “speculative” metaphysic rather than an empirical one. Blaga is firmly persuaded that metaphysical theories are not (and cannot be) proven empirically, although he accords a significant role to experience in the testing of such theories. His method resembles the hypothetico-deductive method wherein a theoretically possible solution to a problem is granted as a working hypothesis, and then the consequences of this hypothesis are deduced in order to determine if they are compatible with generally accepted theory. If they are, then the hypothesis stands as provisionally vindicated, despite the fact that the hypothesis itself has not been directly verified empirically.

Blaga states that metaphysical starting points are presupposed at the outset of the metaphysical investigation and are only subsequently justified by their ability to organize data and to “construct a world.” In elucidating his metaphysical vision, Blaga proposes a cluster of premises that are essential to the system he intends to promulgate. He then elaborates how these form the basis of a system that provides, or enables, the resolution of certain important problems heretofore not satisfactorily resolved by other metaphysical systems.

It is widely acknowledged that Blaga accepts and works within a sort of neo-Kantian Idealism, wherein the actual existence of an external world is accepted as a necessary metaphysical corollary even though an external world is not directly knowable epistemologically. If doing metaphysics would be defined along realist lines, as an accurate description of “noumenal” reality, then Blaga would not be able to do metaphysics, since according to his epistemology humanity cannot have perfect knowledge of objects of cognition. However, because Blaga views metaphysics as a creative and pragmatically justified endeavor that attempts to reach beyond the empirical and provide a theoretical explanation for all of existence, metaphysics is possible.

One of the first issues addressed in Blaga’s metaphysical writings is the question of the origin of the cosmos. It is conceivable that the cosmos has no origin, and that it has always existed. Alternatively, it is possible that the cosmos has a specific origin. Blaga opts for the latter view because it “enormously facilitates approaching cosmological problems” and is therefore to be preferred. Based on this pragmatic justification, he proceeds to construct his metaphysics around a postulated beginning and source of the world.

That both the origin and the source of the cosmos are unknown is admitted by Blaga. Therefore one of the ways that he refers to the source is “The Anonymous Fund.” Theoretically, the cosmos could be a result of one or more creative acts of this Fund acting upon external preexistent sources; it could be an emanation from the Fund; or it could even be a reproduction of the Fund. Blaga rejects the possibility of creation using sources outside of the Fund, presumably because this would entail the existence of a cosmos that precedes the creation of the present cosmos, introducing a regress that thwarts the solving of the problems that Blaga is addressing. He also rejects the possibility of creation ex nihilo. Blaga opts for a theory of emanation similar to that proposed by Plotinus, an emanation wherein the Fund reproduces itself endlessly without diminishing itself in any way.

Blaga proposes that the Fund be viewed as possessing, due to its own “fullness,” the capacity of infinite self-replication. It controls its reproduction so that it will not destabilize existence. (Blaga grants that this sort of talk is necessarily metaphorical.) But it is the nature of the Fund to create/reproduce (this is inherent in the meaning of “fund”); therefore it allows itself to reproduce, but only in a specific mode that assures the longevity and greatest success of its reproductive acts. This controlled reproduction is the best compromise between the Fund’s capacity for replication and the necessity of safeguarding the centrality of existence. Had such precautions not been taken, the result of the Fund’s creative capacity would be a series of competing funds rather than the present world. What is remarkable, according to Blaga, is not so much that the present world exists, but that a series of competing funds does not exist. The present world is a result of the Fund’s own self-limitation, of the partial thwarting of the Fund’s natural creativity.

The form that the controlled reproduction of the Anonymous Fund takes is that of creation through “differentials”. Differentials are minute particles emanated from the Fund that exactly replicate minute aspects of the Fund and are emanated in endless numbers. The differentials have a natural propensity to combine with each other, forming new subcreations. The most central differentials are withheld from emanation in order to prevent the recombination of differentials into a copy of the Anonymous Fund. The recombination of emitted differentials has created the present world in its ever-changing forms.

This schema depicts the origin of the world as taking place in three phases: (1) the operation of limiting the generative possibilities of the Anonymous Fund, (2) the emission of differentials, and (3) the combination of differentials, creating more complex beings through integration. The schema also depicts the creation of the world as being based upon two fundamental factors, the Anonymous Fund’s reproductive potential and its success in directing this potential into creating in a manner that preserves its own hegemony as metaphysical center of the universe.

Integration of the differentials is a natural result of the fact that the differentials are, in their structure, particles of one integrated whole. But integration does not occur on the basis of a perfect match between differentials. If it did, there would only be one line of integration that would result in only one type of created being. Integration takes place on the basis of a merely sufficient match between differentials. This allows for a vast number of different integrations, which explains such empirical phenomena as the existence of sometimes similar, sometimes identical or parallel features in entities that belong to different kingdoms, classes, phyla, and species.

Blaga offers the following empirical analysis in support of his theory that the world is composed of differentials. Upon close inspection, it can be observed that all empirical existents display at least three types of discontinuity: (1) Structural discontinuity: some existents are very simple structurally, others are very complex. (2) Intrinsic discontinuity: existents are at the same time independent and interdependent. (3) Discontinuity of repetition: groups of existents of the same type are composed of individuals. These phenomena are explained by the existence of discontinuity in the very heart of the empirical world. This fundamental discontinuity is a result of the empirical world being composed of a multitude of diverse differentials, variously integrated and organized. Furthermore, Blaga argues that two lines of empirical proof show that creation takes place through something akin to differentials: (1) The widespread consistency of certain structures and the equally widespread variability of others indicates that at the base of existence there is a discontinuity of elements that are capable of a variety of different combinations. (2) The presence of similar or identical features in entities that are otherwise very different from each other likewise indicates that existence is composed of a variety of elements capable of forming a variety of combinations.

Blaga discusses how the Anonymous Fund concept differs from and is similar to the theistic conception of God. Both are conceived as being the source of all else, the most central of all existents, and the greatest existent, to the extent that their own existence surpasses all others in both extent and in quality. However, Blaga states that he hesitates to use the term God to refer to his conception of the central metaphysical entity both because there are significant differences between his own conception and that of traditional theology, and because he believes it impossible to know whether the attributes usually ascribed to God apply to the Anonymous Fund. He grants that the term “God” could be used as a synonym for the Anonymous Fund, since according to his metaphysics there is nothing in existence that is more central than the Anonymous Fund. But Blaga will not even affirm that the Fund is a being in the usual sense, saying rather that conceiving it thus is merely a “crutch” used by the understanding.

Blaga sees the product of self-reproduction of the Anonymous Fund as necessarily differentiated from the Fund itself in order to preserve the order of the cosmos. This differentiation is accomplished by the Fund in order to achieve a specific goal. The goal and benefits of differentiated creation include: (1) facilitation of the fulfillment of the Fund’s generative nature, (2) the avoidance of genesis of innumerable identical “hypostases,” and (3) the avoidance of genesis of complex, indivisible, and indestructible existents that would have too great an autarchic potential, (4) the generation of complex existents that do not infringe upon numbers 2 and 3 above, (5) the genesis of an immense variety of existents and beings, (6) a proportioning of existents between those that are simple and those that are more complex, and (7) the generation of beings with cognitive capacity while at the same time censoring that capacity so as to protect both the beings and the order of the universe. Blaga believes that his proposal shows that the Anonymous Fund has employed a means of genesis that achieves a maximum number of advantages through the employment of a minimum number of measures.

He states that the existence of dis-analogy between Creator and creation is paradoxical. It is paradoxical because the expected result of an Anonymous Fund as postulated by Blaga would be the production of other entities like itself, the production of identical self-replications. Blaga finds it surprising but empirically evident that this self-replication does not take place. The explanation for this surprising nonoccurrence is the necessity of thwarting “theo-geneses” in order to preserve the necessary order of existence. Thus the apparent paradox is only an initial paradox, which is seen to be resolvable through the means of minus-cognition (as discussed in Blaga’s epistemology).

In Blaga’s metaphysics there are two important measures employed by the Anonymous Fund in preservation of cosmic equilibrium. One of these has already been discussed: differentiated creation. The other is transcendent censorship. While many metaphysicians have struggled with the question “What is the nature of existence?” and many epistemologists have struggled with “What are the methods of knowledge?” relatively few have sought to answer the question “What is it that impedes our answering of these fundamental questions?” Blaga insightfully observes that this “prohibitive factor” is one of the factors of existence that philosophy has yet to reckon with.

Blaga proposes that ultimate questions are difficult to answer, and in some sense unanswerable, because in addition to the ontological limit that the Anonymous Fund has imposed upon creation (through the means of differentiated creation), the Fund has also imposed a cognitive limit on creation. This was done at the time of the creation of the cosmos, and is now an inherent aspect, affecting all modes of cognition. Blaga refers to this limit as “transcendent censorship.” This censorship is accomplished via a network of factors, including obligatory epistemic reliance on the concrete, the intervention of cognitive structures, the resulting “dissimulation of the transcendent,” and “the illusion of adequacy.” Transcendent censorship not only prevents humans from having positive-adequate knowledge of the mysteries of existence, it prevents them from having “positive-adequate” knowledge of any object of cognition whatsoever. Blaga points out that this view has an interesting difference from the Kantian/neo-Kantian view. In Kant’s epistemology, existence is passive in the cognitive event; according to Blaga’s theory, existence is active in preventing itself from being known.

According to Blaga, the result of transcendent censorship is that all human knowledge is either dissimulation (in which objects of cognition are represented as being other than they really are), or negative cognition (in which antinomian elements of a cognitive problem are reconciled through the employment of a heuristic “theory idea,” which leads to a deepened understanding of the problem without resulting in its complete elimination), or a combination of these. This does not indicate that Blaga is a skeptic, however. Even the “mysteries” of existence are approachable through the strategy that Blaga names “luciferic cognition,” although they are not actually reachable.

The reasons that the Anonymous Fund would impose censorship upon its creation are similar to the reasons for its dissimulation of creation. Blaga lists the following four reasons for transcendent censorship: (1) Human possession of perfect knowledge would upset the equilibrium of existence by bestowing perfection on limited beings. (2) Human possession of perfect knowledge might threaten the benign governance of the universe by introducing the possibility of a human cognitive rival to the Anonymous Fund. (3) Possession of absolute knowledge would ossify the human spirit, quenching human creativity. (4) Censorship spurs human creativity and exertion, giving humanity its raison d’etre. To this list could be added the explanation that human creativity is one indirect outlet of the creativity of the Anonymous Fund, and anything that lessens human creativity is an attack on the creative intentions of the Fund.

The responsibility for the human inability to arrive at an absolute understanding of existence therefore rests squarely upon the Anonymous Fund, for benevolent reasons. This is in striking contrast to the philosophical system of Descartes, wherein God’s righteousness and benevolence are made the foundation of all sure knowledge. In Blaga’s system, the benevolence and wisdom of the Anonymous Fund result in the prevention of sure knowledge.

It is clear that Blaga’s metaphysical system can say relatively little about the actual structure of the universe, because according to this system such knowledge is structurally excluded from human cognition. Blaga’s system does allow for metaphysical postulation, however, and these postulates can be supported or substantiated by experience and by pragmatic arguments. Thus Blaga justifies himself in asserting that the cosmos has a center, and that this center is the Anonymous Fund.

Blaga does take stands on several of the standard issues of cosmology. He rejects both naive realism and subjective idealism (a la Berkeley), opting for a neo-Kantian critical realism. With regards to the monism-pluralism controversy, Blaga is clearly a pluralist. While the cosmos is a result of one single entity, and is composed of pieces emitted from that one entity, these pieces (the differentials) are separate, distinct entities in their own right. They are permanent and unchanging, and are the building blocks of all else that exists. Although Blaga is a realist, he is not a materialist. Differentials are not material, but rather are submaterial. They underlie all material existents, but underlie nonmaterial realities as well.

According to Blaga, humanity is, in a sense, the very pinnacle of the Anonymous Fund’s creation, because the human consciousness is the most complex organization of differentials it has permitted. There is also another sense in which humanity is the pinnacle of creation: more than any other complex created existent, humanity has the ability to further the Fund’s own creative activity. Humans are naturally creative, and their creations can be viewed as secondary creations of the Anonymous Fund.

Human existence is characterized by two modes of existence, the “paradisaic” mode, which is the normal state of life in the world, and the “luciferic” mode, which is life lived in the presence of mystery and for the purpose of “revealing” it (grappling with it; trying to make it understandable). The latter mode results in an “ontological mutation” that is unique in the universe and essential to full humanness. “Mystery” is a result of the protective limits imposed on creation by the Anonymous Fund (transcendent censorship and the discontinuity between creator and creation). Through these means the Fund bestows upon humanity a destiny and a purpose in life: humanity’s purpose is to create; its destiny is to strive (through creating) to reveal the mysteries of existence.

Since the mysteries of existence are not ultimately fathomable by humans, humanity is doomed to a continual striving to reveal them, sometimes experiencing partial successes, but never reaching the ultimate goal. In Blaga’s vision, human history becomes an endless, permanent creative state, never reaching its goal, but never exhausting its source of motivation and meaningfulness either. Through this artifice the Anonymous Fund gives to humanity a goal, a purpose, and gives it the unique historicity that makes it so culturally rich. Thus historicity is one of the greatest dimensions of human existence. It is seen to be a vital aspect of “luciferic” humanness. Likewise, the “principle of conservation of mystery,” which was made part of the very fiber of existence in order to preserve the centrality of the Anonymous Fund from the ambitions of created beings, is seen to be one of the chief metaphysical conditions of the historicity of humanity.

This description highlights the two opposing components that shape human history: the inner human desire to creatively reveal mystery, and the necessity of the Anonymous Fund to thwart this desire. This desire and its lack of fulfillment are here seen as essential both to the historicity of humanity and to full humanness, since they provide the peaks and valleys of failed attempts and renewed aspirations toward the absolute of which human history is composed.

The human inability to have absolute knowledge is often viewed as a failure, shortcoming, or handicap. Blaga reverses this evaluation, making human subjectivity and relativity essential to humanness and the glory of the human situation: according to Blaga, these factors give humanity its role and place in a great ontological scheme. Humans are not the deplorable victims of their own limits that they are sometimes supposed to be; rather, they are the servants of a system that is so great it surpasses them.

The final question of cosmology might be, “Is there anything beyond this cosmos?” Transcendent censorship does not prevent Blaga from having an answer to this question. All that exists is either one of two things: a structure of differentials emitted by the Anonymous Fund, or the Anonymous Fund itself. The cosmos is composed of differentials, as discussed above. The Fund, on the other hand, is not composed of differentials. Therefore the Anonymous Fund is not part of the cosmos. The answer to this question, then, is that there is something “beyond” the cosmos, but only one thing: the Anonymous Fund.

5. Other Philosophical Issues

From this sketch of Blaga’s epistemology and metaphysics one can infer the major themes and directions of the rest of his philosophy. His philosophy of culture elevates culture to the pinnacle of human existence. Culture is a product of the human drive to creatively “reveal” the mysteries of reality and the thwarting of this drive by the Anonymous Fund. Its creativity is an extension of the creativity of the Fund itself, and lends beauty and meaning to human existence. In his philosophy of history he describes humans as historical beings who derive their meaningfulness through living in the face of the unknown, wrestling with it, and conquering it, only to find that it rises up again, providing ever new mountains to climb. Human history is a record of a long series of only partially successful attempts to master our world. (It can be seen that history and culture are closely related, both as subjects and as themes in Blaga’s oeuvre.)

Blaga’s attitude towards science is fairly remarkable considering the positivistic philosophical currents of the early 20^th century. He has a great appreciation for science as a cognitive approach that combines both paradisaic and luciferic cognition. As can be anticipated, his application of his epistemology to science leads to insights similar to those of Michael Polanyi and Thomas Kuhn. His is not a critique of science, per se, but rather an explanation of how science operates, locating it within the range of human creative endeavors that aim at revealing the mysteries of existence. As such, science, like art, religion, and all other human cognitive enterprises can be successful, but only within the boundaries postulated by Blaga’s metaphysics.

Blaga views religion as yet another attempt to penetrate the mysteries of existence. Religion is perhaps the grandest of all such attempts, since it aims the highest, but it is also the most doomed, since its reach far outstretches its grasp. He argues that religion is a cultural production, which is a position that caused great animosity toward him on the part of some contemporary Romanian theologians. However, an implication of his metaphysic is that religion is a response to the transcendent Anonymous Fund, a position that is fairly harmonious with Romanian Orthodox theology. And Blaga admits that his “Anonymous Fund” could also be termed “God,” though he explains that he avoids using this term because it carries with it so much baggage.

Blaga’s primary books on philosophy of culture are the three that comprise his “Trilogy of Culture”: Orizont si stil (Horizon and Style), Spatiul mioritic (The Ewe-Space), and Geneza metaforei si sensul culturii (The Genesis of Metaphor and the Meaning of Culture). His philosophy of history is exposited together with his philosophical anthropology in Aspecte antropologice (Anthropological Aspects) and Fiinta istorica (The Historical Being), two of the books making up his “Cosmological Trilogy.” He addresses issues in the philosophy of science in Experimentul si spiritual mathematic (Experiment and the Mathematical Spirit) and Stiinta si creatie (Science and Creation). His theory of aesthetics is outlined in Arta si valoare (Art and Value), and his philosophy of religion is explained in Gandire magica si religiei (Magical Thinking and Religion) and in a set of lecture notes that were posthumously published as Curs de filosofia religiei (Curse on the Philosophy of Religion).

6. References and Further Reading

Blaga authored many books and articles. Unfortunately, while all of his poetry and some of his theater is available in English, his philosophy remains to be translated. An anthology of fragments, which have been translated into English, with some secondary sources in English as well, is available on CD from Richard T. Allen.

a. Primary Sources

i. English

Blaga, Lucian, and Andrei Codrescu (trans.). At the Court of Yearning. Columbus, OH: Ohio State University Press, 1989.
Blaga, Lucian, and Brenda Walker (trans.). Complete Poetical Works of Lucian Blaga. Iasi, RO, Oxford, GB, and Portland, USA: Center for Romanian Studies, 2001.
Blaga, Lucian, and Doris Planus-Runey (trans.). Zalmoxis: Obscure Pagan. Iasi, RO, Oxford, GB, and Portland, USA: Center for Romanian Studies, 2000.
Interestingly, some of Blaga’s poetry, accompanied by music and visuals, is also available on YouTube.

ii. Romanian

Eonul dogmatic (The Dogmatic Age). Bucharest: Cartea Romaneasca, 1931.
Cunoasterea luciferica (Luciferic Knowledge). Sibiu: Tiparul Institutului de arte grafice “Dacia Traiana,” 1933.
Cenzura transcendenta: Incercare metafizica. (Transcendent Censorship: A Metaphysical Attempt). Bucharest: Cartea Româneasca, 1934.
Orizont si stil (Horizon and Style). Bucharest: Fundatia pentru literatura si arta “Regele Carol II,” 1935.
Spatiul mioritic (The Ewe-Space). Bucharest: Cartea Româneasca, 1936.
Geneza metaforei si sensul culturii (The Genesis of Metaphor and the Meaning of Culture). Bucharest: Fundatia pentru literatura si arta “Regele Carol II,” 1937.
Arta Si valoare (Art and Value). Bucharest: Fundatia pentru literatura si arta “Regele Carol II,” 1939.
Diferentialele divine (The Divine Differentials). Bucharest: Fundatia pentru literatura si arta “Regele Carol II,” 1940.
Despre gandirea magica (Concerning Magical Thinking). Bucharest: Fundatia regala pentru literatura si arta, 1941.
Religie si spirit (Religion and Spirit). Sibiu: Editura “Dacia Traiana,” 1942.
Stiinta si creatie (Science and Creation). Sibiu: Editura “Dacia Traiana,” 1942.
Despre constiinta filosofica (Concerning Philosophical Consciousness). Cluj-Napoca: Lito-Schildkraut, 1947.
Aspecte antropologice (Anthropological Aspects). Cluj-Napoca: Uniunea nationala a studentilor din Romania, Centrul studentesc Cluj, 1948.
Experimentul si spiritul matematic (Experiment and the Mathematical Spirit). Bucharest: Editura Stiintifica, 1969.
Fiinta istorica (The Historical Being). Cluj-Napoca: Editura Dacia, 1977.

iii. Other Languages

Orizzonte e stile, ed. Antonio Banfi. Milano: Minuziano Editore, 1946.
Zum Wesen der rumanischen Volkseele, ed. Mircea Flonta. Bucharest: Editura Minerva, 1982.
L’Eon dogmatique, L’Age d’Homme, trans. Jessie Marin, Raoul Marin, Mariana Danesco, and Georges Danesco. Lausanne: Editions l’Age d’Home, 1988.
L’Eloge du village roumain, ed. Jessie Marin and Raoul Marin. Paris: Librairie du Savoir, 1989.
L’Etre historique, trans. Mariana Danesco. Paris: Librairie du Savoir, 1990.
Les Differentielles divines, trans. Thomas Bazin, Raoul Marin, and Georges Danesco. Paris: Librairie du Savoir, 1990.
La trilogie de la connaissance, trans. Raul Marin and Georges Piscoci-Danescu. Paris: Librairie du Savoir, 1992.
Trilogia della cultura: Lo spazio mioritico, trans. Ricardo Busetto and Marco Cugno. Alessandria, IT: Editionni dell’Orso, 1994.

b. Secondary Sources in English

Bejan, Cristina. “The Paradox of the Young Generation in Inter-war Romania,” Slovo, 18:2 (Autumn 2006): 115-128.
Botez, Angela. “Comparativist and Valuational Reflections on Blaga’s Philosophy,” Revue Roumaine de Philosophie et Logique 40 (1996): 153–62.
Botez, Angela. “Lucian Blaga and the Complementary Spiritual Paradigm of the 20th Century,” Revue Roumaine de Philosophie et Logique 37 (1993): 51–55.
Botez, Angela. “The Postmodern Antirepresentationalism (Polanyi, Blaga, Rorty),” Revue Roumaine de Philosophie et Logique 41 (1997): 59–70.
Eliade, Mircea. “Rumanian Philosophy,” in Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ed. Paul Edwards (New York: Macmillan and the Free Press, 1967).
Flonta, Mircea. “Blaga, Lucian.” In Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy Online, edited by E. Craig. London: Routledge, 2004, (accessed January 3, 2006).
Hitchins, Keith. “Introduction to Complete Poetical Works of Lucian Blaga,” translated by Brenda Walker, 23–48. Iasi, RO, Oxford, Portland, USA: Center for Romanian Studies, 2001.
Isac, Ionut. “Considerations on some Historical and Contemporary Issues in Lucian Blaga’s Metaphysics,” Journal for the Study of Religions and Ideologies 7:19, spring 2008, 184-202.
Jones, Michael S. “Culture and Interreligious Understanding according to the Romanian Philosopher Lucian Blaga,” Journal of Ecumenical Studies 45: 1, winter 2010, 97-112.
Jones, Michael S. “Culture as Religion and Religion as Culture in the Philosophy of Lucian Blaga,” Journal for the Study of Religions and Ideologies no. 15, winter 2006, 66-87.
Jones, Michael S. “The Metaphysics of Religion: Lucian Blaga and contemporary philosophy.” Teaneck and Madison, NJ: Fairleigh Dickenson University Press, 2006.
Munteanu, Bazil. “Lucian Blaga, Metaphysician of Mystery and Philosopher of Culture,” Revue Roumaine de Philosophie et Logique 39 (1995): 43–46.
Nemoianu, Virgil. “Mihai Sora and the Traditions of Romanian Philosophy,” Review of Metaphysics 43 (March 1990): 591–605.
Nemoianu, Virgil. “A Theory of the Secondary: Literature, Progress, and Reaction.” Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1989, 153 –170.

Author Information

Michael S. Jones
Email: msjones2@liberty.edu
Liberty University
U. S. A.

Manbendra Nath Roy (1887—1954)

M. N. Roy was a twentieth century Indian philosopher. He began his career as a militant political activist and left India in 1915 in search of arms for organizing an insurrection against British rule in India. However, Roy’s attempts to secure arms ended in a failure, and finally in June 1916, he landed in San Francisco, California. It was there that Roy, who was then known as Narendra Nath Bhattacharya, changed his name to Manbendra Nath Roy. Roy developed friendships with several American radicals, and frequented the New York Public Library. He began a systematic study of socialism, originally with the intention of combating it, but he soon discovered that he had himself become a socialist! Roy met Lenin in Moscow in 1920, and went on to become an international ranking communist leader. Nevertheless, in September 1929 he was expelled from the Communist International for various reasons. He returned to India in December 1930 and was sentenced to six years imprisonment for his role in the Kanpur Communist Conspiracy Case.

Roy’s real philosophical quest began during his prison years which he decided to use for writing a systematic study of ‘the philosophical consequences of modern science’, which would be a re-examination and re-formulation of Marxism to which he subscribed since 1919. The reflections, which Roy wrote in jail over a period of five years, grew into nine rigorous volumes. The ‘Prison Manuscripts’ have not yet been published in their totality, and are currently preserved in the Nehru Memorial Museum and Library Archives in New Delhi. However, selected portions from the manuscript were published as separate books in the 1930s and the 1940s.

In his philosophical works, Roy has made a clear distinction between philosophy and religion. According to Roy, no philosophical advancement is possible unless we get rid of orthodox religious ideas and theological dogmas. On the other hand, Roy has envisaged a very close relationship between philosophy and science. Moreover, Roy has given a central place to intellectual and philosophical revolution in his philosophy. Roy maintained that a philosophical revolution must precede a social revolution. Besides, Roy has, in the tradition of eighteenth century French materialist Holbach, revised and restated materialism in the light of twentieth century scientific developments. In the context of Indian philosophy, Roy could be placed in the tradition of ancient Indian materialism—both Lokayata and Carvaka.

Life
Writings
1. Autobiographical
2. Philosophical
Roy’s Concept of Philosophy
Roy’s New Humanism: Twenty-Two Theses on Radical Democracy
Philosophical Revolution or Renaissance
Roy’s Materialism or Physical Realism
Roy’s Intellectual Legacy
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life

M. N. Roy’s original name was Narendra Nath Bhattacharya. He was born on 21 March 1887, at Arbalia, a village in 24 Parganas district in Bengal. His father, Dinabandhu Bhattacharya, was head pandit of a local school. His mother’s name was Basanta Kumari.

a. Militant Nationalist Phase: In Search of Arms

Roy began his political career as a militant nationalist at the age of 14, when he was still a student. He joined an underground organization called Anushilan Samiti, and when it was banned, he helped in organizing Jugantar Group under the leadership of Jatin Mukherji. In 1915, after the beginning of the First World War, Roy left India for Java in search of arms for organizing an insurrection to overthrow the British rule in India. From then on, he moved from country to country, using fake passports and different names in his attempt to secure German arms. Finally, after wandering through Malay, Indonesia, Indo-China, Philippines, Japan, Korea and China, in June 1916, he landed at San Francisco in United States of America.

Roy’s attempts to secure arms ended in a failure. The Police repression had shattered the underground organization that Roy had left behind. He had also come to know about the death of his leader, Jatin Mukherji, in an encounter with police.

b. Towards Communism

The news of Roy’s arrival at San Francisco was somehow published in a local daily, forcing Roy to flee south to Palo Alto, California near Stanford University. It was here that Roy, until then known as Narendra Nath Bhattacharya or Naren, changed his name to Manbendra Nath Roy. This change of name on the campus of Stanford University enabled Roy to turn his back on a futile past and look forward to a new life of adventures and achievements.

Roy’s host at Palo Alto introduced him to Evelyn Trent, a graduate student at Stanford University. Evelyn Trent, who later married Roy, became his political collaborator. She accompanied him to Mexico and Russia and was of great help to him in his political and literary work. The collaboration continued until they separated in 1929.

At New York, where he went from Palo Alto, Roy met Lala Lajpat Rai, the well-known nationalist leader of India. He developed friendships with several American radicals, and frequented the New York Public Library. Roy also went to public meetings with Lajpat Rai. Questions asked by the working class audience in these meetings made Roy wonder whether exploitation and poverty would cease in India with the attainment of independence. Roy began a systematic study of socialism, originally with the intention of combating it, but he soon discovered that he had himself become a socialist! In the beginning, nurtured as he was on Bankimchandra, Vivekanand and orthodox Hindu philosophy, Roy accepted socialism except its materialist philosophy.

Later in Mexico in 1919, Roy met Michael Borodin, an emissary of the Communist International. Roy and Borodin quickly became friends, and it was because of long discussions with Borodin that Roy accepted the materialist philosophy and became a full-fledged communist.

In 1920, Roy was invited to Moscow to attend the second conference of the Communist International. Roy had several meetings with Lenin before the Conference. He differed with Lenin on the role of the local bourgeoisie in nationalist movements. On Lenin’s recommendation, the supplementary thesis on the subject prepared by Roy was adopted along with Lenin’s thesis by the second conference of the Communist International. The following years witnessed Roy’s rapid rise in the international communist hierarchy. By the end of 1926, Roy was elected as a member of all the four official policy making bodies of the Comintern – the presidium, the political secretariat, the executive committee and the world congress.

In 1927, Roy was sent to China as a representative of the Communist International. However, Roy’s mission in China ended in a failure. On his return to Moscow from China, Roy found himself in official disfavor. In September 1929, he was expelled from the Communist International for “contributing to the Brandler press and supporting the Brandler organizations.” Roy felt that he was expelled from the Comintern mainly because of his “claim to the right of independent thinking.” (Ray 1987)

c. Return to India: Prison Years

Roy returned to India in December 1930. He was arrested in July 1931 and tried for his role in the Kanpur Communist Conspiracy Case. He was sentenced to six years imprisonment.

When Roy returned to India, he was still a full-fledged communist, though he had broken from the Comintern. The forced confinement in jail gave him more time than before for systematic study and reflection. His friends in Germany, especially his future wife, Ellen Gottschalk, kept providing him books, which he wanted to read. Roy had planned to use his prison years for writing a systematic study of ‘the philosophical consequences of modern science’, which would be in a way a re-examination and re-formulation of Marxism to which he had been committed since 1919. The reflections, which Roy wrote down in jail, grew over a period of five years into nine thick volumes (approximately over 3000 lined foolscap-size pages). The ‘Prison Manuscripts’ have not so far been published in their totality, and are currently preserved in the Nehru Memorial Museum and Library Archives in New Delhi. However, selected portions from the manuscript were published as separate books in the 1930s and the 1940s. These writings show that Roy was not satisfied with a primarily economic explanation of historical processes. He studied and tried to assess the role of cultural and ideational factors in traditional and contemporary India, in the rise and expansion of Islam, and in the phenomenon of fascism. He was particularly severe on the obscurantist professions and practices of neo-Hindu nationalism. Roy tried to reformulate materialism in the light of latest developments in the physical and biological sciences. He was convinced that without the growth and development of a materialist and rationalist outlook in India, neither a renaissance nor a democratic revolution would be possible. In a way, seeds of the philosophy of new humanism, which was later developed fully by Roy, were already evident in his jail writings.

d. Beyond Communism: Towards New Humanism

Immediately after his release from jail on 20 November 1936, Roy joined Indian National Congress along with his followers. He organized his followers into a body called League of Radical Congressmen. However, in December 1940, Roy and his followers left Congress owing to differences with the Congress leadership on the role of India in the Second World War. Thereafter, Roy formed the Radical Democratic Party of his own. This signaled the beginning of the last phase of Roy’s life in which he developed his philosophy of new humanism.

After Roy’s release from jail in 1936, Ellen Gottschalk joined Roy in Bombay in March 1937. They were married in the same month. Subsequently, Ellen Roy played an important role in Roy’s life, and cooperated in all of his endeavors.

Roy prepared a draft of basic principles of “radical democracy” before the India conference of the Radical Democratic Party held in Bombay in December 1946. The draft, in which his basic ideas were put in the form of theses, was circulated among a small number of selected friends and associates of Roy. The “22 Theses” or “Principles of Radical Democracy”, which emerged as a result of intense discussions between Roy and his circle of friends, were adopted at the Bombay Conference of the Radical Democratic Party. Roy’s speeches at the conference in connection with the 22 Theses were published later under the title Beyond Communism.

In 1947, Roy published New Humanism – A Manifesto, which offered an elaboration of the 22 Theses. The ideas expressed in the manifesto were, according to Roy, “developed over a period of number of years by a group of critical Marxists and former Communists.”

Further discussions on the 22 Theses and the manifesto led Roy to the conclusion that party-politics was inconsistent with his ideal of organized democracy. This resulted in the dissolution of the Radical Democratic Party in December 1948 and launching of a movement called the Radical Humanist Movement. At the Calcutta Conference, itself where the party was dissolved, theses 19 and 20 were amended to delete all references to party. The last three paragraphs of the manifesto were also modified accordingly. Thus, the revised versions of the 22 Theses and the manifesto constitute the essence of Roy’s New Humanism.

e. Final years

In 1946, Roy established the Indian Renaissance Institute at Dehradun. Roy was the founder-director of the Institute. Its main aim was to develop and organize a movement to be called the Indian Renaissance Movement.

In 1948, Roy started working on his last major intellectual project. Roy’s magnum opus Reason, Romanticism and Revolution is a monumental work (638 pages). The fully written, revised and typed press copy of the book was ready in April 1952. It attempted to combine a historical survey of western thought with an elaboration of his own system of ideas. While working on Reason, Romanticism and Revolution, Roy had established contacts with several humanist groups in Europe and America, which had views similar to his own. The idea gradually evolved of these groups coming together and constituting an international association with commonly shared aims and principles. The inaugural congress of the International Humanist and Ethical Union (IHEU) was planned to be organized in Amsterdam in 1952, and Roy was expected to play an influential role in the congress and in the development of the IHEU.

However, before going abroad, Roy needed some rest. He and Ellen Roy went up for a few days from Dehradun to the hill station of Mussoorie. On June 11 1952, Roy met a serious accident. He fell fifty feet down while walking along a hill track. He was moved to Dehradun for treatment. On the 25^th of August, he had an attack of cerebral thrombosis resulting in a partial paralysis of the right side. The accident prevented the Roys from attending the inaugural congress of the IHEU, which was held in August 1952 at Amsterdam. The congress, however, elected M.N. Roy, in absentia, as one of its vice-presidents and made the Indian Radical Humanist Movement one of the founder members of the IHEU. On August 15 1953, Roy had the second attack of cerebral thrombosis, which paralyzed the left side of his body. Roy’s last article dictated to Ellen Roy for the periodical Radical Humanist was about the nature and organization of the Radical Humanist Movement. This article was published in the Radical Humanist on 24 January 1954. On January 25 1954, ten minutes before midnight, M.N. Roy died of a heart attack. He was nearly 67 at that time.

2. Writings

a. Autobiographical

Roy was a prolific writer. He wrote many books edited, and contributed to several journals. However, he was reluctant to write about himself. M. N. Roy’ Memoirs (627 pages), which he wrote after initial reluctance, only covers a short period of six years from 1915. When Roy was in an Indian prison, his friends in Germany, especially his future wife, Ellen Gottschalk, kept providing him books, which he wanted to read. Roy’s letters to her from jail, published subsequently as Letters from Jail (1943), contains pointers to his reading and thinking during those years.

b. Philosophical

Four volumes of Selected Works of M. N. Roy, edited by Sibnarayan Ray, have been published by the Oxford University Press. Many of the writings of M. N. Roy such as Revolution and Counter-Revolution in China belong to the period when he was a communist. We have already mentioned some of his works related to the final humanist phase of his life, such as, Beyond Communism, New Humanism – A Manifesto and Reason, Romanticism and Revolution. According to M. N. Roy, his books Scientific Politics (1942) along with New Orientation (1946) and Beyond Communism (1947) constitute the history of the development of radical humanism. The final ideas are, of course, contained in New Humanism.

As mentioned earlier, Roy’s real philosophical quest began during his prison years after returning to India in 1930. He decided to use his prison years for writing a systematic study of ‘the philosophical consequences of modern science’, which was to be in a way a re-examination and re-formulation of Marxism to which he subscribed since 1919. The reflections, which Roy wrote down in jail, grew over a period of five years into nine thick volumes (approximately over 3000 lined foolscap-size pages). The ‘Prison Manuscripts’ have not so far been published in their totality, and are currently preserved in the Nehru Memorial Museum and Library Archives in New Delhi. However, selected portions from the manuscript were published as separate books in the 1930s and the 1940s. Materialism (1940), Science and Superstition (1940), Heresies of the 20^th Century (1939), Fascism (1938), The Historical Role of Islam (1939), Ideal Of Indian Womanhood (1941), Science and Philosophy (1947) and India’s Message (1950) are among the books that were made from these handwritten note books. Of these Materialism and Science and Philosophy, are of special interest from the point of view of studying Roy’s concept of philosophy and his formulations on materialism.

Since 1937, Roy was editing a new weekly named Independent India. In 1949, Independent India weekly changed to The Radical Humanist weekly. The name of another quarterly journal The Marxian Way, which Roy had been publishing since 1945 in collaboration with Sudhindranath Datta, was changed to The Humanist Way in the same year. The Humanist Way has ceased publication, but The Radical Humanist is still being published by the Indian Renaissance Institute as a monthly.

3. Roy’s Concept of Philosophy

Philosophy, according to Roy, is contemplation, study and knowledge of nature. Its function is “to know things as they are, and to find the common origin of the diverse phenomena of nature, in nature itself”.

Philosophy, says Roy, begins when “spiritual needs” of human beings are no longer satisfied by primitive natural religion, which imagines and worships a variety of gods as personification of the diverse phenomena of nature. The grown-up human is no longer satisfied with the nursery-tales, with which “he was impressed in his spiritual childhood”. Intellectual growth emboldens him to seek the causes of all natural phenomena in nature itself and to “find in nature a unity behind its diversity.” (Roy 1951)

In his book Science and Philosophy, Roy defines philosophy as “the theory of life”. The function of philosophy, in words of Roy, “is to solve the riddle of the Universe”. According to Roy, philosophy is born out of the efforts of man to explain nature and to understand his own relationship with it. (5-6)

a. Philosophy and Metaphysics

Roy has made a distinction between philosophy and metaphysics. According to him, metaphysics also begins with the desire to discover the unity behind the diversity. However, it leaves the ground of philosophy in its quest for a “noumenon” beyond nature, something that is distinct from “phenomena”. Thus, it abandons the inquiry into what really exists, and “plunges into the wilderness of speculation”. It takes up the absurd task of knowing the intangible, as the condition for the knowing the tangible.

It is obvious that Roy was opposed to speculative philosophy, which set for itself the impossible task of prying into the transcendental being “above and behind” the physical universe – of acquiring the knowledge of the reality behind the appearance. According to Roy, an inquiry, which denies the very existence of the object to be enquired, is bound to end in idle dreams and hopeless confusion.

b. Philosophy and Religion

Roy was opposed not only to speculative philosophy but also to the identification of philosophy with poetic fancy or theology and religion. According to him, for the average educated human, the term philosophy has a very vague meaning. It stands not only for speculative thought, but also for poetic fancy. Not only that, in India, philosophy is often not distinguished from religion and theology. “Indeed,” according to Roy, “what is generally believed to be the distinctive feature of Indian philosophy is that it has not broken away from the medieval tradition, as modern Western philosophy did in the seventeenth century.”

According to Roy, faith in the supernatural does not allow the search for the causes of natural phenomena in nature itself. Therefore, rejection of orthodox religious ideas and theological dogmas is the precondition for philosophy. Roy was of the view that, religion will certainly be liquidated by the rise of science, because scientific knowledge enables humankind to answer questions, confronted by which in its childhood, it was forced to assume super-natural forces or agencies. Therefore, according to Roy, in order to perform its function, “philosophy must break away from religion” and start from the reality of the physical universe.

c. Philosophy and Science

On the one hand, Roy regards rejection of orthodox religious ideas and theological dogmas as the essential precondition of philosophy, and on the other, he envisages a very intimate relationship between philosophy and science. In fact, according to Roy, the philosophical significance of modern scientific theory is to render untenable the old division of labor between science and philosophy. Science is, says Roy, stepping over the old boundary line, “Digging deeper and deeper into the secrets of nature, science has come up against problems, the solution of which was previously left to philosophy. Scientific inquiry has pushed into what is traditionally regarded as the ‘metaphysical’ realm.”

The problems of philosophy – cosmology, ontology and epistemology – can all be progressively solved, according to Roy, in the light of scientific knowledge. The function of philosophy is, points out Roy, to explain existence as a whole. An explanation of existence requires knowledge of existence. Knowledge about the different phases of existence is being gathered by the various branches of science. Therefore, says Roy, the function of philosophy is to coordinate an entire body of scientific knowledge into a comprehensive theory of nature and life. Philosophy can now exist only as the science of sciences – a systematic coordination, a synthesis of all positive knowledge, continuously readjusting itself to progressive enlargement of the store of human knowledge. A mystic metaphysical conception of the world is no longer to be accorded the distinction of philosophy. Thus, according to Roy, philosophy is a logical coordination of all the branches of positive knowledge in a system of thought to explain the world rationally and to serve as a reliable guide for life.

4. Roy’s New Humanism: Twenty-Two Theses on Radical Democracy

“New Humanism” is the name given by Roy to the “new philosophy of revolution” which he developed in the later part of his life. This philosophy has been summarized by Roy in the “Twenty-Two Theses” and elaborated in his New Humanism – A Manifesto.

New Humanism, as presented in the Twenty-Two Theses, has both a critical and a constructive aspect. The critical aspect consists of describing the inadequacies of communism (including the economic interpretation of history), and of formal parliamentary democracy. The constructive aspect, on the other hand, consists of giving highest value to the freedom of individual, presenting a humanist interpretation of history, and outlining a picture of radical or organized democracy along with the way for achieving the ideal of radical democracy.

a. Basic Tenets of New Humanism

Apart from Roy’s effort to trace the quest for freedom and search for truth to the biological struggle for existence. The basic idea of the first three theses of Roy is individualism. According to Roy, the central idea of the Twenty-Two Theses is that political philosophy must start from the basic idea that the individual is prior to society, and freedom can be enjoyed only by individuals.

Quest for freedom and search for truth, according to Roy, constitute the basic urge of human progress. The purpose of all-rational human endeavor, individual as well as collective, is attainment of freedom in ever-increasing measure. The amount of freedom available to the individuals is the measure of social progress. Roy refers back the quest for freedom to human being’s struggle for existence, and he regards search for truth as a corollary to this quest. Reason, according to Roy, is a biological property, and it is not opposed to human will. Morality, which originates from the rational desire for harmonious and mutually beneficial social relations, is rooted in the innate rationality of man.

b. Humanist Interpretation of History

In his humanist interpretation of history, presented in theses four, five and six, Roy gives an important place to human will as a determining factor in history, and emphasizes the role of ideas in the process of social evolution. Formation of ideas is, according to Roy, a physiological process but once formed, ideas exist by themselves and are governed by their own laws. The dynamics of ideas runs parallel to the process of social evolution and both of them influence each other. Cultural patterns and ethical values are not mere super structures of established economic relations. They have a history and logic of their own.

c. Inadequacies of Communism

Roy’s criticism of communism, contained in theses seven to eleven is based mainly on the experience of the former Soviet Union, particularly the “discrepancy between the ideal and the reality of the socialist order.” According to Roy, freedom does not necessarily follow from the capture of political power in the name of the oppressed and the exploited classes and abolition of private property in the means of production. For creating a new world of freedom, revolution must go beyond an economic reorganization of society. A political system and an economic experiment which subordinate the man of flesh and blood to an imaginary collective ego, be it the nation or class, cannot possibly be, in Roy’s view, the suitable means for the attainment of the goal of freedom.

The Marxian doctrine of state, according to which the state is an instrument of exploitation of one class by another, is clearly rejected by Roy. According to Roy, the state is “the political organization of society” and “its withering away under communism is a utopia which has been exploded by experience”.

Similarly, Roy rejects the communist doctrine of the dictatorship of the proletariat. “Dictatorship of any form, however plausible may be the pretext for it, is,” asserts Roy, “excluded by the Radical-Humanist perspective of social revolution”.

d. Shortcomings of Formal Parliamentary Democracy

Roy has discussed the shortcomings of formal parliamentary democracy in his twelfth and thirteenth theses. These flaws, according to Roy, are outcome of the delegation of power. Atomized individual citizens are, in Roy’s view, powerless for all practical purposes, and for most of the time. They have no means to exercise their sovereignty and to wield a standing control of the state machinery.

“To make democracy effective,” says Roy, “power must always remain vested in the people and there must be ways and means for the people to wield sovereign power effectively, not periodically, but from day to day.”

e. Radical Democracy

Thus, Roy’s ideal of radical democracy, as outlined in theses fourteen to twenty-two consists of a highly decentralized democracy based on a network of people’s committee’s through which citizens wield a standing democratic control over the state.

Roy has not ignored the economic aspect of his ideal of radical democracy. He argued that progressive satisfaction of the material necessities is the pre-condition for the individual members of society unfolding their intellectual and other finer human potentialities. According to him, an economic reorganization, which will guarantee a progressively rising standard of living, is the foundation of the Radical Democratic State. “Economic liberation of the masses”, says Roy, “is an essential condition for their advancing towards the goal of freedom.”

The ideal of radical democracy will be attained, according to Roy, through the collective efforts of mentally free men united and determined for creating a world of freedom. They will function as the guides, friends and philosophers of the people rather than as their would-be rulers. Consistent with the goal of freedom, their political practice will be rational and, therefore, ethical.

Roy categorically asserts that a social renaissance can come only through determined and widespread endeavor to educate the people as regards the principles of freedom and rational co-operative living. Social revolution, according to Roy, requires a rapidly increasing number of men of the new renaissance, and a rapidly expanding system of people’s committees and an organic combination of both. The program of revolution will similarly be based on the principles of freedom, reason and social harmony.

As pointed out by Roy himself in his preface to the second edition of the New Humanism: A Manifesto, though new humanism has been presented in the twenty-two theses and the Manifesto as a political philosophy, it is meant to be a complete system. Because of being based on the ever-expanding totality of scientific knowledge, new humanism cannot be a closed system. “It will not be”, says Roy, “a dogmatic system claiming finality and infallibility.”

f. Philosophical Revolution or Renaissance

It is obvious from the foregoing that Roy was a great supporter of philosophical revolution or renaissance, and he has given a central place to it in his radical humanism. Roy was an admirer of European renaissance and drew inspiration from it. For him, “the renaissance was the revolt of man against God and his agents on this earth”. According to Roy, the renaissance “heralded the modern civilization and the philosophy of freedom”. He strongly believed that India, too, needed a renaissance on rationalist and humanist lines. According to him, this was a necessary condition for democracy to function in a proper manner. He believed that “a new Renaissance based on rationalism and cosmopolitan humanism” was essential for democracy to be realized. (Roy has used the word “rationalist” not in the Cartesian sense but in the popular sense. In this sense, a “rationalist” regards reason including both perception and inference as a source of knowledge.)

According to Roy, a philosophical revolution must precede a social revolution. He was opposed to blind faith and superstitions of all kinds and supported rationalism. As a physical realist, he rejected all allegedly supernatural entities like god and soul. Similarly, he was opposed to fatalism and the doctrine of karma. He unequivocally rejected the religious mode of thinking and advocated a scientific outlook and a secular morality. As noted earlier, he was in favor of delinking philosophy with religion and associating it closely with science. He believed that science would ultimately liquidate religion.

According to Roy, a revolutionary is one who has got the idea that the world can be remade, made better than it is to-day, that it was not created by a supernatural power, and therefore, could be remade by human efforts.

Further, according to Roy, “the idea of improving upon the creation of God can never occur to God-fearing. We can conceive of the idea only when we know that all gods are our own creation, and we can depose whomsoever we have enthroned.”

Roy’s critical approach towards religion comes out very clearly in the preface of his book, India’s Message, where he asserts that a criticism of religious thought and a searching analysis of traditional beliefs and the time-honored dogmas of religion is essential for the belated Renaissance of India. “The spirit of inquiry should overwhelm the respect for tradition.”

According to Roy, “a critical examination of what is cherished as India’s cultural heritage will enable the Indian people to cast off the chilly grip of a dead past. It will embolden them to face the ugly realities of a living present and look forward to a better, brighter and pleasanter future.” Thus, Roy was opposed to an uncritical and vain glorification of India’s so-called “spiritual” heritage. However, he did not stand for a wholesale rejection of ancient Indian thought either. He favored a rational and critical approach towards ancient traditions and thoughts. Roy believed that the object of European renaissance was to rescue the positive contributions of ancient European civilization, which were lying buried in the Middle Ages owing to the dominance of the Church. Roy had something similar in his mind about India. According to him, one of the tasks of the Renaissance movement should be to rescue the positive outcome and abiding contributions of ancient thought – contributions, which just like the contributions of Greek sages, are lying in ruins under the decayed structure of the Brahmanical Society – the tradition of which is erroneously celebrated as the Indian civilization.

5. Roy’s Materialism or Physical Realism

a. Roy’s Materialism

M .N. Roy was a strong supporter of materialist philosophy. According to Roy, strictly speaking, materialism is “the only philosophy possible”, because it represents the knowledge of nature as it really exists—knowledge acquired through the contemplation, observation and investigation of nature itself.

Roy points out that materialism is not the “monstrosity” it is generally supposed to be. It is not the cult of “eat, drink and be merry”, as it has been depicted by its ignorant or malicious adversaries. It simply maintains that “the origin of everything that really exists is matter, that there does not exist anything but matter, all other appearances being transformations of matter, and these transformations are governed necessarily by laws inherent in nature.” (Roy 1951)

Thus, broadly speaking, Roy’s philosophy is in the tradition of materialism. However, there are some important differences between Roy’s materialism and traditional materialism. In fact, Roy’s “materialism” is a restatement of traditional materialism in the light of contemporary scientific knowledge. According to Roy, the substratum of the universe is not matter as traditionally conceived, but it is “physical as against mental or spiritual”. It is, in other words, “a measurable entity”. Therefore, says Roy, to prevent prejudice, materialism could be renamed “physical realism”.

b. Roy’s Materialism and Traditional Materialism

Roy was of the view that materialism must be dissociated from certain notions, which have been rendered untenable by the discoveries of science. His revision and restatement of materialism embraces both the basic tenets of materialism: the concept of matter as well as the doctrine of physical determinism.

i. Change in the Concept of “Matter”

According to Roy, the discoveries of quantum physics have “made the classical notion of matter untenable”. Nevertheless, Roy insists that though the substratum of the universe is “not matter as traditionally conceived” it is “physical as against mental or spiritual. It is a measurable entity”.

The so-called “crisis” of materialism, according to Roy, involved the conception of matter, and not its existence. The “crisis” simply exposed the inadequacy of the old atomist theory. The substance of the “crisis” was, “that it appeared to reduce matter from mass to energy and radiation”. However, there cannot be any doubt about the fact that “atomic physics deals with material realities which exist objectively, outside the mind of the physicist.” Thus, in Roy’s physical realism “matter” is not made up of hard and massy stone-like atoms as in traditional “mechanical materialism”. The whole concept of “matter” has been revised in the light of new physics. In fact, Roy was even ready to discard the term “matter” provided a more appropriate new term could be coined. In Science and Philosophy, Roy describes “matter” as the “sole-existence.” According to Roy, it is not very important what name is attached to the “substratum of existence” – matter, energy, action, vibratory motion or field. However, he insists that it is a physical reality. What Roy means by calling it physical is that it exists objectively and that it is measurable. As we have seen, Roy has even renamed his revised version of materialism as “physical realism”.

ii. Revision of Physical Determinism

Roy disagrees with the view of some thinkers that Heisenberg’s Principle of Uncertainty requires the rejection of the doctrine of determinism. According to Roy, only a modification in the traditional conception of causality is required. Causality, in Roy’s view, is not an a priori form of thought or an axiomatic law; it is physical relation inherent in the constitution of the universe.

Roy, in fact, tries to temper a rigidly mechanical view of determinism by interpreting it in terms of probability. He admits plurality of possibilities and the element of contingency in the world, and tries to show that determinism and probability are not mutually exclusive. However, Roy insists that statistical methods presuppose determinism. The universe is a law-governed system, and the existence of law presupposes causality. He is emphatic that the element of uncertainty in the sub-atomic world is not to be equated with indeterminacy. Rejection of the idea that there are invariant relations in nature, maintains Roy, will blast the very foundation of science.

Roy also tries to reconcile “freedom of will” with determinism. According to him, human beings possess free will and can choose out of various alternatives in front of them. Roy, however, is not unique among materialists in recognizing free will. Epicurus, among ancient Greek materialists, and Hobbes, among modern materialists, tried to accommodate free will in their philosophies. According to Roy, the vast world of biological evolution lies between the world of human beings and the world of inanimate matter, and, therefore, the world of human beings has its own specific laws, though these laws can be referred back to the general laws of the world of dead matter. Nevertheless, human will, says Roy, cannot be directly related to the laws of physical universe. Thus, Roy is not, to use the terminology of William James, a “hard” determinist like Holbach, but a “soft” determinist like Hobbes.

iii. Objective Reality of Ideas and the Autonomy of the Mental World

Though Roy traces the origin of mental activities to the physical background of the living world, yet he also grants them an objective existence of their own. Mind and matter, according to Roy, can be reduced to a common denominator; as such, they are two objective realities. In Roy’s view, once formed, ideas exist by themselves, governed by their own laws. Thus, Roy grants much more objectivity and autonomy to the mental world than has been traditionally granted by materialists. Roy’s materialism is not an “extreme” materialism like that of the eighteenth century French materialist, Julien de la Mettrie, who regarded man to be a self-moving machine. According to Roy, on the other hand, “Man is not a living machine, but a thinking animal”.

iv. Emphasis on Ethics

Roy has given a very important place to ethics in his philosophy. According to Roy, “the greatest defect of classical materialism was that its cosmology did not seem to have any connection with ethics”. Roy strongly asserts that if it is not shown that materialist philosophy can accommodate ethics, then, human spirit, thirsting for freedom, will spurn materialism. In Roy’ view materialist ethics is not only possible but also the noblest form of morality. Roy links morality with human being’s innate rationality. Human beings are moral, according to Roy, because they are rational. In Roy’s ethics freedom, which he links with the struggle of existence is the highest value. Search for truth is a corollary to the quest for freedom.

However, Roy is not unique among materialists in emphasizing the importance of ethics in his philosophy. Contrary to popular impression, ancient materialist Epicurus and modern materialist Holbach, for example, accorded an important place to ethics in their philosophies. However, the details of Roy’s ethics are somewhat different from these philosophers.

c. Roy’s Materialism and Marxian Materialism

Before he formulated and expounded his own philosophy of New Humanism, Roy was an orthodox Marxist. In fact, Roy’s revision of materialism was carried out in the context of Marxism. Thus, Roy’s revision of materialism in general is also applicable to Marxian materialism to the extent Marxian materialism resembles traditional materialism.

Roy’s Physical Realism is, however, different from Marxian materialism in three important ways:

i. Delinking of Dialectics and Materialism

Roy considers the Hegelian heritage a weak spot of Marxism. The simplicity and scientific soundness of materialism are marred by making its validity conditional upon dialectic. According to Roy, materialism pure, and simple, can stand on its own legs, and, therefore, he tries to de-link dialectics from materialism. The validity of materialism, maintains Roy, is in no way conditional on dialectics, as there is no logical connection between the two.

ii. Rejection of Historical Materialism

Roy rejects historical materialism and advocates a humanist interpretation of history in which he gives an important place to human will as a determining factor in history, and he recognizes the autonomy of the mental world. He argues that human will cannot be directly related to the laws of physical universe. Ideas, too, have an objective existence, and are governed by their own laws. The economic interpretation of history is deduced from a wrong interpretation of materialism.

iii. Emphasis on Ethics

Roy’s materialism is sharply different from Marxian materialism in so far it recognizes the importance of ethics and gives a prominent place to it. According to Roy, Marxian materialism wrongly disowns the humanist tradition and thereby divorces materialism from ethics. The contention that “from the scientific point of view this appeal to morality and justice does not help us an inch farther” was based, according to Roy, upon a false notion of science.

d. Roy and Lokayata

His materialism or physical realism could be placed in the tradition of ancient Indian materialism: Lokayata or Carvaka. In fact, in the third chapter of his book Materialism, titled “Materialism in Indian Philosophy”, Roy has approvingly referred to Lokayata. According to him, “the long process of the development of naturalist, rationalist, skeptic, agnostic and materialist thought in ancient India found culmination in the Charvak system of philosophy, which can be compared with Greek Epicureanism, and as such is to be appreciated as the positive outcome of the intellectual culture of India”. (94)

6. Roy’s Intellectual Legacy

Roy was a former Marxist and a hero of Indian communists for having rubbed shoulders with Lenin and Stalin. However, he later gave up Marxism and advocated his own “radical humanism”. Naturally, he has been criticized generally by Marxists and communists for renouncing Marxism as well as for finding fault with communist doctrines like “the dictatorship of the proletariat”. Nonetheless, there was a small group of intellectuals who collaborated closely with him in preparing the “Twenty-two Theses on Radical Democracy” and New Humanism: A Manifesto; namely, V. M. Tarkunde, Phillip Spratt, Laxman Shastri Joshi, Sibnarayan Ray, G. D. Parikh, G. R. Dalvi, Sikander Choudhary and Ellen Roy (Roy’s wife). Some of them like Tarkunde, Sibnarayan Ray and G. D. Parikh remained active in the radical humanist movement launched by Roy and also wrote and edited books on him. (See References and Further Reading)

Among the journals founded by M. N. Roy, The Humanist Way, has ceased publication, but The Radical Humanist is still being published as a monthly by the Indian Renaissance Institute. It was edited for a long time by Tarkunde. Since Tarkunde, it has been edited by R. M. Pal and R. A. Jahagirdar among others.

Outside the select group of Roy’s close friends and associates, A. B. Shah, founder of the Indian Secular Society and The Secularist journal was one of the important intellectuals influenced by Roy’s ideas.

Some of his final ideas are open to criticism even from a humanist perspective. For example, Roy’s use of the word “spiritual” in certain contexts is problematic. Roy talks of “spiritual needs” and “spiritual childhood” of human beings (Section 3), when, in fact, he was a materialist. He was at pains to emphasize that reality is “physical as against mental or spiritual” (Section 5 a ). As a materialist, he was also opposed to the vain glorification of the so-called “spiritual” heritage of India. (Section 4 f ) Apparently, Roy has used the word “spiritual” in phrases like “spiritual needs” and “spiritual childhood” in the sense of “intellectual.” Nonetheless, the use of the term “spiritual” by Roy even in these contexts could be misleading, considering the fact that he did not believe in the existence of soul and spirit. (Ramendra 2001)

Roy’s advocacy of party-less democracy, too, is open to criticism. Freedom of association is a fundamental democratic freedom. In any democracy worth the name, citizens with similar political ideas and programs are bound to come together and cooperate with one another by forming political parties and other non-party organizations. The only possible way to prevent them from doing so will be to deny the fundamental right to association, which will be an undemocratic act in itself. Therefore, the ideal of “party-less democracy” seems to be self-contradictory, impractical and unrealizable.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Parikh, G. D. compiler. Essence of Royism (Bombay: Nav Jagriti Samaj, 1987).
- Anthology of M. N. Roy’s writings by one of his close academician associates.
Ray, Sibnarayan. ed., Selected Works of M. N. Roy, vol. I, (Delhi: Oxford University Press, 1987).
- Altogether four volumes have been published. The first volume contains an illuminating introduction written by the editor, another close academician associate of Roy.
Roy, M. N. and Spratt, Phillip. Beyond Communism (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1981).
- Shows Roy’s transition from Marxism to Humanism.
Roy, M. N. India’s Message (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1982).
- One of the books made out of the ‘Prison Manuscripts’. Published originally as the second volume of Fragments of a Prisoner’s Diary. First volume was titled Memoirs of a Cat.
Roy, M. N. Letters from Jail ( Calcutta: Renaissance Publishers Private Ltd., 1965).
- Third volume of Fragments of a Prisoner’s Diary. Letters written to his future wife and a close associate, Ellen Roy.
Roy, M. N. Materialism (Calcutta: Renaissance Publishers Ltd., 1951).
- From the ‘Prison Manuscripts’.
Roy, M. N. M. N. Roy’s Memoirs (New Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1983).
- Covers a short period of six years from 1915.
Roy, M. N. New Humanism – A Manifesto (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1981).
- Roy’s final ideas on humanism
Roy, M. N. New Orientation (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1982).
- Transition from Marxism to Humanism.
Roy, M. N. Politics, Power and Parties (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1981).
- Roy’s views on party-politics.
Roy, M. N. Reason, Romanticism and Revolution (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1989).
- Last major work.
Roy, M. N. Science and Philosophy (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1984).
- From the ‘Prison Manuscripts’.
Roy, M. N. Scientific Politics (Calcutta: Renaissance Publishers, 1947).
- Transition from Marxism to Humanism

b. Secondary Sources

Karnik, V. B. M. N. Roy (New Delhi: National Book Trust, 1980).
- A biography of Roy by one of his close associates.
Pal, R. M. ed., Selections from the Marxian Way and the Humanist Way (Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 2000).
- Selections from the journal The Marxian Way and The Humanist Way (changed name), edited by Roy.
Ramendra. M. N. Roy’s New Humanism and Materialism (Patna: Buddhiwadi Foundation, 2001).
- A critical study of Roy’s new humanism and materialism.
Ray, Sibnarayan, ed. M.N. Roy Philosopher-Revolutionary (New Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1995).
- Contains some writings of M. N. Roy, but also writings of many others on Roy, including that of V. B. Karnik, Suddhindranath Datta, Ellen Roy, Laxman Shastri Joshi, Phillip Spratt, G. D. Parikh, Stanley Maron and H. J. Blackham.
Tarkunde, V. M. Radical Humanism (New Delhi: Ajanta Publications, 1983).
- An exposition of radical humanism by an intellectual-activist and a close associate of Roy.

Author Information

Ramendra Nath
Email: ramendra@sancharnet.in
Patna University
India

Angélique Arnauld (1591—1661)

The reforming abbess of the convent of Port-Royal, Mère Angélique Arnauld developed an Augustinian philosophy deeply influenced by the Jansenist movement. Her philosophy of God follows the via negativa in its stress on God’s incomprehensibility. Her theory of moral virtue is emphatically theocentric; even such natural virtues as patience are presented as emanations of grace. The monastic virtues of poverty and humility receive pride of place in this account. Reflecting her struggle with political and ecclesiastical authorities, Arnauld’s philosophy stresses the rights of women to education, to theological culture, to self-government, and to fidelity to personal conscience. Although she affirms the existence of free will, Arnauld’s emphasis on the depth of human depravity and the dependence of the moral agent on divine grace for the execution of virtuous action bears the traces of theological determinism. Long considered a minor voice in the Jansenist strand of Augustinian philosophy developed by Antoine Arnauld and Blaise Pascal, Angélique Arnauld’s original variations on Augustinianism have recently been underscored by feminist commentators. The abbess’s gendered account of virtue is drawn from the experience of nuns committed to a strict contemplative life. Her defense of the rights of women to theological culture and opinion challenged the patriarchal commands issued by throne and altar that recommended religious silence for nuns.

Biography
Works
Philosophical Themes
Interpretation and Relevance
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Born on September 8, 1591, Jacqueline Marie Arnauld belonged to a prominent noblesse de robe family. Both her father Antoine Arnauld and her mother Catherine Marion Arnauld descended from families renowned for their lawyers, parliamentarians, and diplomats. Her grandfather Antoine Arnauld the Elder had battled the Jesuits in the parlement of Paris. The family’s juridical culture and hostility to the Jesuits would durably mark the younger generation during the battle over Jansenism.

From her infancy, Jacqueline Marie Arnauld had been designated by the family as a future nun and superior. In 1599 her maternal grandfather Simon Marion successfully obtained from King Henri IV the royal appointment of his niece as the abbess of Port-Royal, a Cistercian convent in the southwestern hinterlands of Paris. The family falsified the age of the abbatial nominee in documents sent to the Vatican in order to circumvent the requirements of canon law. To receive the rudiments of religious education, Jacqueline Marie was sent to the decadent convent of Maubuisson, governed by the sister of the king’s mistress. Despite the low level of education, the nascent abbess discovered Stoicism through her reading of Plutarch. Now known by her religious name as Mère Marie-Angélique de Sainte-Magdalene [popularly as Mère Angélique], the young nun was formally installed as coadjutor abbess on April 10, 1602 and upon the death of Abbess Jeanne Boulehart on July 3, 1602, was declared the abbess of Port-Royal. This childhood experience of forced vocations, trafficking in religious office, and perjury to attain social position would influence the mature Mère Angélique’s campaign to abolish just such abuses in the name of vocational freedom.

The eleven-year old abbess had inherited a lax convent containing scarcely a dozen nuns. Liturgical offices had languished; sermons were rarely heard; the nuns entertained themselves by leisurely visits with the neighbors, masked balls, and elaborate decoration of their private apartments. In 1608, Mère Angélique underwent a sudden conversion. With the reluctant consent of her subjects, she launched the convent’s reform. Her reforms included the abolition of private property and the institution of strictly communal property; the restoration of the rule of silence; the restoration of the night office; the institution of a vegetarian diet; the strict practice of cloister, with visitors relegated to a parlor divided by a grille. The Angelican reform campaign reached a dramatic apogee on September 15, 1609, the journée du guichet, when Mère Angélique refused her own family admission to the convent.

Intellectual as well as moral, the Angelican reform also devoted itself to the development of a theological culture by the nuns. Distinguished theologians, notably Archange de Pembroke, Benot de Canfield, and François de Sales, preached and lectured at the convent. The philosophical and theological orientation of these preachers was clearly Augustinian rather than Thomistic. This new Augustinian intellectual culture was reinforced by readings from Saint Augustine and Saint Bernard of Clairvaux at table and by the neo-Augustinian conferences on the spiritual life delivered by Mère Angélique herself. During the Oratorian ascendancy (1626-33), when Oratorian priests served as the convent’s chaplains, Port-Royal fell under the influence of the mystical école française. A disciple of the Pseudo-Dionysius, Pierre Bérulle defended apophatic theology, in which the negative attributes of the godhead are underscored; Charles Condren stressed the annihilation of self which is essential for union with God and authentic knowledge of the divine attributes. The Oratorian themes of divine incomprehensibility and annihilation of the human subject clearly influenced Mère Angélique’s philosophy.

Under Mère Angélique’s direction, Port-Royal flourished as a model of reformed convent life. In 1626, the convent opened a Parisian branch in the neighborhood adjacent to the Sorbonne. In 1629, King Louis XIII approved one of the abbess’s most cherished reforms: the election of the abbess by the convent nuns themselves rather than by royal appointment; the term of office would now be fixed (three years) rather than lifetime. The nuns elected Mère Geneviève Tardiff as Mère Angélique’s successor in 1630. The new episcopal overseer of the convent, Bishop Sebastien Zamet, opposed Mère Angélique on the nature of conventual reform; the austere Angelican reform was soon replaced by more theatrical liturgies and greater intercourse with the Parisian lay elite. The effort of Zamet and Mère Angélique to develop a new religious order, the ephemeral Institut du Saint-Sacrement (1633-36), ended in bitter failure. The election of Mère Angélique’s sister Mère Agnès Arnauld as Port-Royal’s new abbess in 1636 permitted a swift return to the principles of the Angelican reform. Appointed as novice mistress, Mère Angélique now focused on the spiritual and intellectual formation of younger community members.

The restoration of the Angelican reform also marked the transformation of Port-Royal into a bastion of Jansenism. Jean de Hauranne, abbé de Saint-Cyran, became the convent chaplain. A friend and disciple of Cornelius Jansen, Louvain theologian and bishop of Ypres, Saint-Cyran propagated the radical Augustinianism of Jansen through sermons, lectures, and spiritual direction. Typical Jansenist themes included radical human depravity, the centrality of predestination, the small number of the elect, complete dependence on divine grace for salvation, and moral rigorism. The imprisonment of Saint-Cyran (1638-43) initiated the French government’s campaign against the convent and its Jansenist theology, perceived as heretical and supportive of political dissidence.

In subsequent decades, the Jansenist orientation of Port-Royal intensified. Devoted to meditation and scholarship, a community of laymen living in the environs of the convent (the solitaires) published the works of Augustine, Jansen, Saint-Cyran, and other authors favored by the Jansenists. These works became the staples of the convent school curriculum and of the texts read aloud during convent meals. The Arnauld family spearheaded the Jansenist movement. Mère Angélique’s brother Antoine the Younger Arnauld emerged as the school’s leading theologian; her brother Henri Arnauld, bishop of Angers, defended Jansenism in the episcopate; her brother Robert Arnauld d’Andilly became the most prolific of the solitaire translators and editors. Through correspondence Mère Angélique personally participated in the philosophical and theological disputes occasioned by Antoine Arnauld’s Frequent Communion (1643), Blaise Pascal’s Provincial Letters (1656), and Jean de Brisacier’s anti-Jansenist Jansenism Confounded (1651).

In 1661 Louis XIV intensified the campaign against Port-Royal. The French government demanded that all clerics, teachers, and members of religious orders sign a statement in which they assented to the papacy’s condemnation of five heretical theses allegedly found in Jansen’s Augustinus. To guide the perplexed conscience of Jansenists during “the crisis of the signature,” Antoine Arnauld developed the droit/fait distinction. According to this distinction, the judgment of the church on matters of faith and morals (droit) binds the conscience of the faithful, since such judgments were essential to the church’s divine mission of guiding people to salvation. On judgments of empirical fact (fait), however, the church’s judgment is fallible, open to subsequent alteration or even reversal. Using the droit/fait distinction, the Jansenists could assent to the church’s condemnation of the five condemned theses concerning grace and freedom; however, they could not assent to what they considered the church’s erroneous judgment of fact that Jansen had actually defended these heretical theories.

Despite Mère Angélique’s efforts at intervention with civil and ecclesiastic authorities, the campaign of coercion against Port-Royal stiffened. In April 1661 the throne closed the convent school and novitiate; the convent’s chaplain and confessors were exiled. In June 1661 the nuns reluctantly signed the controversial statement concerning Jansen but they declared that they only offered a reserved assent, to be interpreted according to the droit/fait distinction. At the urging of Louis XIV, the Vatican quickly annulled the reserved signature and demanded unconditional submission to all the church’s judgments in the controversy.

In the midst of the crisis Mère Angélique Arnauld died on August 6, 1661.

2. Works

From a philosophical perspective, two works written by Mère Angélique Arnauld merit particular attention. They are her correspondence and a series of conferences she gave at Port-Royal.

Published in 1742-44 as the three-volume Letters of Reverend Mère Angélique Arnauld, Abbess and Reformer of Port-Royal [L], the massive correspondence of Mère Angélique includes more than thirteen hundred letters and more than one hundred correspondents. Her letters to her scholarly brothers, Antoine Arnauld and Robert Arnauld d’Andilly, clearly express her philosophical Augustinianism. She repeatedly declares herself a “disciple of Saint Augustine” and defends neo-Augustinian positions on the nature of virtue, the critique of casuistry, and the relationship between grace and freedom. Her letters to her nephew Antoine Le Maître and her niece Angélique Arnauld d’Andilly present the abbess’s theories of the rights of the conscience and the limits of civil and ecclesiastical authority. Numerous letters study the exercise of authority by women. In her correspondence with fellow women superiors, Mère Angélique emphasizes the right of superiors to act as the convent’s principal spiritual director, including the right to appoint the convent’s chaplain and confessors and to instruct the nuns in theological matters germane to convent life. Her extensive correspondence with Marie-Louise de Gonzague, queen of Poland, analyzes the virtues necessary for Christian women to govern others in the civic sphere and to endure reversals of fortune.

The correspondence also indicates Mère Angélique’s philosophical and theological culture. Outside of the Bible, Saint Augustine is the author most cited in the letters; his Confessions are the work most frequently quoted. The abbess often cites neo-Augustinian authors in the Jansenist circle: Saint-Cyran, Blaise Pascal, Antoine Arnauld, Pierre Nicole, Claude Lancelot, Antoine Singlin, and Antoine Le Maître. Saint Teresa of Avila, whose works were translated into French by Robert Arnauld d’Andilly, is the most influential of the women authors cited by Mère Angélique, especially in her considerations on the exercise of authority by women.

Published in 1757, Speeches or Conferences of Reverend Mother Marie-Angélique Arnauld, Abbess and Reformer of Port-Royal [C] are transcriptions of the informal talks given by the abbess to the nuns at Port-Royal during the 1650s. In these conferences the abbess often addresses moral issues pertinent to convent life. She argues that it is intention rather than the quality of an act that determines the act’s moral worth. Her severe judgments on minor ethical lapses by nuns and laity reflect the influence of Saint-Cyran’s moral rigorism.

Other major works by Mère Angélique include her autobiographical Report Written by Mère Angélique Arnauld, in which the abbess defends her policy of conventual reform, and her Commentary on the Rule of Saint Benedict, especially her discussion of the monastic virtue of humility.

3. Philosophical Themes

Angélique Arnauld develops philosophical arguments in three major areas: philosophy of God, especially the question of divine attributes; moral philosophy, in particular theory of the virtues; and gender theory, especially as it relates to the education and spiritual rights of women. Arnauld’s philosophical reflection is subordinated to her larger theological project of Augustinian theology and reflects the distinctive culture of a convent devoted to the Jansenist cause.

a. Apophatic Theology

In her presentation of the divine attributes, Mère Angélique focuses on God’s incomprehensibility. This apophatic theology stresses that what the human agent cannot grasp about the divine essence far surpasses what the human agent claims to know through positive images and concepts.

This incapacity to penetrate God’s essence stems from the stark alterity between divine and human natures. “Everything God does is above human ability. It is incomprehensible to our minds. If we exist before God as if we were the smallest ants, is it so strange that we can neither know him nor grasp his intentions…. Between human beings and God there is no proportion. They must acknowledge that God is a being infinitely superior to them. As a result, it is impossible for them to know his ways” [C, 254]. Analogical affirmations of God’s attributes collapse in such an account of divine/human otherness. The sinful nature of postlapsarian humanity deepens the chasm between humanity and God. Only divine self-revelation can disclose a glimmer of God’s authentic nature to a human reason enticed by idols of its own imagination.

Arnauld’s apophatic theology underscores a particular dimension of divine incomprehensibility: inscrutability. Although the Christian affirms the operation of divine providence in the ordering of the world, the accurate interpretation of God’s intention behind a particular historical act eludes human power. “The judgments and ways of God are admirable. Often God seems to want to destroy when he wants to edify. What appears to be the result of his wrath and justice is actually the result of his mercy. Blessed are the souls who perceive in every event only God’s holy will in order to submit to it” [L; to the Abbess of Gif; 23 December 1651]. Arnauld’s appeal to God’s inscrutability also expresses the voluntarist cast of her philosophy of God and of human nature. It is divine sovereignty and self-abandonment to the divine will that are central in the convenant between God and the believer.

b. Virtue Theory

In her correspondence and conferences, Mère Angélique not only exhorts her public to the practice of virtue; she repeatedly defines the virtues in the context of monastic life. Furthermore, she defends an Augustinian account of the moral virtues. Authentic moral virtue can only spring from the operation of the theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity. The theological virtues themselves are the gift of divine grace, not the creation of human endeavor. Apparently natural virtues, such as the cardinal virtue of courage, are only the masks of pride.

Arnauld’s discussion of the virtues privileges those moral habits typical of conventual life. Rooted in the monastic vow of poverty, the virtue of poverty not only renounces personal possessions and cultivates sympathy for the materially poor; it refuses all aesthetic pleasures, even those found in liturgical arts and ceremonies. Contempt for the world inevitably provokes persecution by the world. “Many graces of God are required in order to disdain the world and tolerate its disdain for us….It is impossible for us to hate the world without the world hating us and considering us fools” [L; To Mademoiselle de Luzanci; September 7, 1650]. The centerpiece of monastic virtue, piety demands complete oblation of oneself. Authentic piety requires total abolition of human personal desire as one obeys the divine will. “God has given everything to humanity so it will give everything to him. By this sacrifice it obtains from God’s goodness the grace to possess him and to reign with him forever” [L; to Marie-Louise de Gonzague, queen of Poland; November 12, 1655]. The moral rigorism typical of the Jansenist movement marks this account of the nature of the prominent virtues in monastic life. Militant opposition to the world accompanies every authentic expression of moral virtue.

The theocentric framework of Arnauld’s virtue theory also appears in her analysis of more secular virtues. Patience is rooted in the recognition of our grave sinfulness before God. Tolerating the imperfections of others prevents us from descending into moral complacency and the illusion of personal perfection. “To avoid falling, we must humbly tolerate the faults of others and of ourselves. We are born in sin and we will be totally liberated from it only at the moment of our death” [L; to Madame Allen; May 12, 1665]. Even the Socratic virtue of self-knowledge undergoes theological reconstruction. The moral self-knowledge granted by divine grace surpasses any self-knowledge acquired by the natural means of reflection. “If you had spent an entire year making an examination of conscience with the most meticulous care, it would have been inferior to the moment when God touched your heart. You could not have been as well prepared and you could not have known your faults as well as you do right now without any personal examination of conscience. It is grace alone that can grant us such knowledge” [L; to Anne de Rohan, Princess de Guéménée; November 15, 1629]. Authentic self-knowledge thus emerges as a product of divine illumination.

Arnauld’s analysis of the moral virtues affirms a traditional tenet of Augustinian virtue theory: that the allegedly natural virtues praised by pagan philosophers are in fact disguised vices and that authentic moral virtue is rooted in the theological virtues grafted into the human will by divine grace. Following the Augustinian perspective, Mère Angélique dismisses the neoclassical virtues of magnanimity and courage as masks of self-satisfaction. “There is nothing more pleasant for a generous person than the act of giving. People so possess courage according to the world’s standard fear nothing so much as asking for something. It is characteristic of the rich to give and the poor to receive” [C, 71]. It is selfless intention, rather than external act, that is the criterion for the existence of authentic virtue. Only the presence of the divinely infused virtues of faith, hope, and charity can provide the proper theocentric motivation for the exercise of the moral virtues. Arnauld’s analysis of these theological virtues expresses her typical rigorism. Faith plunges the moral agent into combat against the world, the flesh, and the devil. Authentic hope turns the believer against the sinful hope of domination that poisons the courtier. Charity demands the annihilation of the self. “Charity is nothing other than the love of God and the love of God is an ardent desire that God reign in everything and that all creatures annihilate themselves and recognize his supreme grandeur and infinite majesty” [C, 77].

Reflecting the Jansenist combat with the French throne and episcopate, Mère Angélique stresses the virtue of suffering for the truth. Under persecution, this virtue of sacrificial witness to the truth has become the hallmark of the convent’s moral character. “I am overwhelmed by the vision I have of the great and singular grace God has granted us to suffer for the truth, trying to serve the souls he has redeemed by his death” [L; to Antoine Arnauld; early 1644]. This suffering for the contested truths of salvation, however, must be animated by the theological virtue of charity. Mère Angélique censures the sarcasm that has increasingly stained the polemical defenses of the convent by Jansenist sympathizers. “I only desire that God may deign to fill you deeply, not only with the knowledge of the truth, but with a perfect love that you practice faithfully and that gives you a humble patience toward everything. The current impassioned applause from so many people disturbs me” [C; to Antoine Arnauld; April 1644]. To be authentic, even the convent’s distinctive willingness to suffer persecution for the sake of doctrinal truth must remain rooted in the infused virtue of charity toward one’s opponents.

c. Theological Determinism

Angélique Arnauld’s heavy emphasis on divine grace as the cause of all virtuous action often appears close to a species of theological determinism. So central is the initiative and sovereignty of God in all cosmic and moral activity that free will appears to disappear. Human beings remain voluntaristic beings inasmuch as they can choose one course of action over another after deliberation, but the deliberative and elective activities appear destined by concupiscence to involve the selection of evil unless divine grace intervenes through an inscrutable decree of divine providence.

The abbess reinforces this theological determinism by her insistence on the Augustinian doctrine of predestination. The salvation of sinners, illustrated through the conversion of the good thief by Jesus on the cross, is due entirely to divine initiative, not to the personal merit of the saved. “God grants his grace to whomever he pleases. This is seen in the prayer of the thief he touched and converted in the very act of sinning. At first he blasphemed just like the other thief; nevertheless, one is taken and the other is left behind. Jesus Christ gazes at the former with his great mercy and leaves the latter by an effect of justice that condemns him” [C, 108]. Moral conversion and the concomitant status of being saved are caused uniquely by divine election.

Reinforcing the Augustinian framework of predestination, Arnauld rejects the compromise solution of human cooperation with divine grace. The abbess insists on the comprehensive nature of divine causation in the act of salvation. “The creature could never cooperate with the grace of God. It would lose infinitely more than it could keep for its use. God’s grace always suffered some loss when it came to us….The creature’s incapacity stems from sin, which is infinitely opposed to this grace” [C, 365]. It is in her discussions of grace and salvation that the theological determinism of Mère Angélique becomes the most pronounced.

Arnauld’s emphasis on divine causation is not without paradox. The abbess repeatedly exhorts her listeners and correspondents to act virtuously and to seek God’s favor, as if they exercised authentic free will and responsibility. But these appeals to moral reform find scant justification in a metaphysics and a moral philosophy that make divine volition the unique cause of physical and ethical action.

d. Gender and Right

The convent is not simply the site for the elaboration of Mère Angélique’s Augustinian philosophy; her corpus defends the right of women, specifically of nuns, to exercise judgments of conscience on matters of theological dispute, even when this entails conflict with political and religious authorities. It also defends the correlative rights of women to education, to theological culture, and to limited autonomy through the selection of superiors and of constitutional law.

In many writings, Arnauld analyzes how women should exercise their rightful authority in the religious and civic spheres. Despite the rigorism of her moral views, Mère Angélique argues that flexibility is central in a religious superior’s exercise of authority. Women superiors must tailor their judgments to the needs of the individual subject. “Superiors must be extremely reserved in all their words. They must weigh all of them according to the golden measure of holy charity. Whether they are exhorting, reproving, or consoling, they must proportion themselves to the capacity of each soul” [L; to the Anonciade superior in Boulogne; May 14, 1640]. Authentic conventual governance involves respect of each individual’s experience and of the superior’s personal judgment in a particular case.

Legalism constitutes a particular danger for this exercise of personalized spiritual governance. Mère Angélique criticizes the tendency of overly detailed constitutions in religious orders to suffocate the right of women superiors to exercise substantial freedom in the governance of their subjects. “In the area of penances, it seems to me that one should usually grant freedom to a superior to act according to her inclinations. She must try to take into account the spirit of God and the different circumstances and not try to regulate all the nuns according to the same manner. The letter kills and the spirit gives life” [L; to Monsieur Macquet; January 4, 1635]. These counsels on the proper exercise of authority religious superiors reinforce the principal provisions of the Angelican reform of the convent. Nuns are to elect their own superiors and to draw up their constitutions and legislation in chapter. Superiors are to act as the principal spiritual directors of their subjects with the authority to appoint chaplains and to direct schools and retreat programs for laywomen.

In her extensive correspondence with Marie-Louise de Gonzague, queen of Poland, Arnauld evokes the virtues central for the exercise of civil authority by women. Like nuns, monarchs must practice the annihilation of self that unites the believer completely to God. “God will treat you in his judgment just as you have treated him here. He will honor those who have honored him as their sovereign lord, considering themselves nothing at all before his divine majesty” [L; to Marie-Louis de Gonzague, queen of Poland; January 20, 1655]. In particular, the queen must practice the love of enemies, a theological virtue that proves especially difficult in time of war. “Your soul should often ponder these words of Our Lord Jesus Christ when he was nailed to the cross in the last extremity and by the most horrible malice and cruelty that could be imagined: ‘Father, forgive them; they did not know what they do.’ It was not only those who crucified the Son of God who did not know that he was the king of glory; it is those who make war on you” [L; to Marie-Louise de Gonzague de Poland; November 5, 1655].

As the persecution of Port-Royal intensified, Mère Angélique insisted on the right and duty of women to follow an informed conscience on the theological disputes of the moment. Appeals to obedience cannot force a nun to assent to a judgment by a political or ecclesiastical authority she believes to be erroneous. Citing the precedent of Teresa of Avila, Arnauld urges Queen Anne of Austria, the French queen-mother, to intervene on behalf of the Port-Royal nuns against the errors of the church on the question of Jansenism. “I believe that God will use the wisdom of Your Majesty and the wisdom of the king, as he used Phillip II, the ancestor of Your Majesty, in the past, to save Saint Teresa from the greatest persecution she had ever known. We see in her writings that even the pope had been wrongly informed about her and the nuns of her order and that his nuncio had been prejudiced against her, thus pushing this conflict, in her own words, to the last step of violence” [L; to Anne of Austria, queen-mother of France; May 25, 1661]. Against the fallible, prudential judgments of both church and state on matters of fact, both nuns and laywomen enjoyed the right to challenge judgments that appeared to wound truth and charity.

4. Interpretation and Relevance

Several factors have impeded a properly philosophical appreciation of the works of Angélique Arnauld. First, apologists for Jansenism have long argued that Mère Angélique was simply ignorant of the theological controversies erupting during the crisis of the signature. Gazier’s defense of the Port-Royal nuns (1929) is typical of such apologetic. Furthermore, Mère Angélique’s spirituality has often been described as practical, more interested in moral than speculative issues. Undoubtedly, Mère Angélique never read Jansen’s Augustinus. But she had certainly read Jansen’s Reformation of the Interior Man, translated by her brother Robert Arnauld d’Andilly from the Latin original, and she had studied Saint-Cyran’s Popular Theology, a summary of Jansenist doctrine that served as the convent school’s major catechetical reference. The misleading portrait of Mère Angélique as a theological innocent baffled by the intricacies of the ecclesiastical quarrel over grace has long closed her canon to philosophical commentary.

Second, the thought of Mère Angélique has often been simply assimilated to the Augustinianism of the male leaders of the Jansenist movement. While the abbess was clearly influenced by the constellation of Augustinian thinkers who surrounded her, especially her brother Antoine Arnauld and her mentor Saint-Cyran, she maintains her own distinctive voice in this school of radical Augustinianism. Her analysis of monastic virtue in a conventual context and her defense of the spiritual rights of women against political and ecclesiastical coercion reflect her own theoretical and gendered priorities.

Finally, the philosophy of Mère Angélique has been obscured by its forbidding theological architecture. The abbess expresses her theories in monastic genres foreign to the philosophical treatise: letters of spiritual direction, abbatial conferences, and commentaries on patristic texts. The substantive issues which preoccupied her appear similarly foreign to contemporary philosophy. Her philosophy of divine attributes, moral virtue, and personal rights are embedded in quarrels over grace and monastic reform that can appear arcane. Philosophical analysis of her works requires a grasp of the early modern theological controversies which provided the occasion for the abbess’s philosophical speculation.

The current revival of interest in the philosophy of Angélique Arnauld is fueled in large part by the feminist effort to expand the cannon of the humanities in the early modern period. Mère Angélique’s defense of the rights of women to exercise religious and political authority has emerged as a central interest in contemporary commentary on her own writings. Kostroun’s study of Port-Royal (2003) focuses on the gendered subversion of authority justified by Mère Angélique and her associates.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

Arnauld, Mère Angélique. Entretiens ou conférences de la Révérende Mère Marie-AngéliqueArnauld, abbesse et réformatrice de Port-Royal (Brussels: A. Boudet, 1757).
- [Transcribed largely by her niece Soeur Angélique de Saint-Jean Arnauld d’Andilly, this series of conferences delivered in the 1650s at Port-Royal expresses the moral rigorism of the abbess.]
Arnauld, Mère Angélique. Lettres de la Révérende Mère Marie-Angélique Arnauld, abbesse et réformatrice de Port-Royal, 3 vols. (Utrechet: Aux dépens de la Compagnie, 1742-44).
- [The facsimile edition of this collection of Mère Angélique’s letters produced by Phénix Éditions in 2003 contains an excellent introduction by Jean Lesaulnier, who identifies the various networks of correspondents with the abbess.]
Arnauld, Mère Angélique. Rélation écrite par la Mère Angélique Arnauld, ed. Louis Cognet (Paris: Grasset, 1949).
- [This autobiographical text is an apologetic for the Angelican reform of Port-Royal and a description of the burgeoning persecution of the convent and the Jansenist movement.]

b. Secondary Sources

Bugnion-Secrétan, Perle. La Mère Angélique Arnauld, 1591-1661, après ses écrits (Paris: Cerf, 1991).
- [This biography of the abbess focuses on her writings, with particular attention to their polemical context.]
Chédeozeau, Bernard. “Idéal intellectuel et vie monastique à Port-Royal,” Chroniques de Port-Royal 37 (1997), 57-74.
- [This article examines the intellectual culture developed at Port-Royal under the Angelican reform and compares it favorably to the anti-intellectual piety dominating most of the convents of the period.]
Conley, John J. Adoration and Annihilation: The Convent Philosophy of Notre Dame (Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press, 2009), 43-112.
- [This chapter analyzes and critiques the neo-Augustinian philosophy developed by the abbess in her letters and conferences.]
Gastellier, Fabian, Angélique Arnauld (Paris: Fayard, 1998).
- [This biography studies the politics of the abbess’s civil and ecclesiastical context.]
Gazier, Cécile. Histoire du monastére de Port-Royal (Paris: Perrin, 1929).
- [This pro-Janenist apologetic history depicts a theologically uncultured Mère Angélique, baffled by the arcane doctrinal disputes by which the enemies of Port-Royal attempted to destroy the convent through charges of heresy.]
Kostroun, Daniella. “A Formula for Disobedience: Jansenism, Gender, and the Feminist Paradox,” Journal of Modern History 75 (2003), 483-522.
- [This article analyzes the subversive nature of the gendered arguments employed by Mère Angélique and her associates against royal and episcopal demands to submission on matters of conscience.]
Rowan, Mary. “Angélique Arnauld’s Web of Feminine Friendships: Letters to Jeanne de Chantal and the Queen of Poland,” in Les femmes au grand siècle; le Baroque; Musique et littérature; Music et liturgie, ed. David Wetsel et al. (Tübingen: Narr, 2003), 53-59.
- [This study of the abbess’s correspondence focuses on her relationship with two prominent women who exercised authority in the religious and civic spheres respectively.]

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University in Maryland
U. S. A.

Social and Political Recognition

Acts of recognition infuse many aspects of our lives such as receiving a round of applause from a rapt audience, being spotted in a crowded street by a long-forgotten friend, having an application for a job rejected because of your criminal record, enjoying some words of praise by a respected philosophy professor, getting pulled over by the police because you are a black man driving an expensive car, and fighting to have your same-sex marriage officially sanctioned in order to enjoy the same benefits as hetero-sexual marriages. Evidently the various ways we are recognised (and recognise others) play an important role in shaping our quality of life. Recognition theorists go further than this, arguing that recognition can help form, or even determine, our sense of who we are and the value accorded to us as individuals.

Political theories of recognition, which attempt to reconfigure the concept of justice in terms of due or withheld recognition, can be contrasted with (but set alongside) the rise of multiculturalism, which has produced an array of literature focused on recognising, accommodating and respecting difference. Although these two trajectories overlap, there are important differences between them. Multicultural politics is rooted in the identity politics underlying various social movements that gained prominence during the 1960s, such as the civil rights movement and radical/cultural feminism. These movements tend to emphasise the distinctness and value of their cultural identity and demand group-specific rights to protect this uniqueness. Without depreciating identity politics and multiculturalism, this article is primarily concerned with political theories of recognition, particularly those formulated by Charles Taylor (who is also a prominent figure in multicultural politics), Nancy Fraser and Axel Honneth. These focus on the role played by recognition in individual identity formation and the normative foundation this can provide to theories of justice.

Despite its brief history as an explicitly political concept, philosophical interest in the idea of recognition can be traced to the work of Hegel, who first coined the phrase ‘struggle for recognition’ (kampf um anerkennung). This article begins by clarifying the specific political and philosophical meaning of recognition. It will provides an overview of Hegel’s remarks on recognition before proceeding to identify the contemporary advocates of recognition. It presents the main similarities and differences between these authors before examining some important criticisms levelled at concept of recognition. The conclusion is a reflection upon the increasing influence of recognition and how it may develop in the future.

Defining Recognition
The Hegelian Legacy
Contemporary Theories of Recognition
Redistribution or Recognition? The Fraser-Honneth Debate
Criticisms of Recognition
The Future of Recognition
References and Further Reading

1. Defining Recognition

The term ‘recognition’ has several distinct meanings: (1) an act of intellectual apprehension, such as when we ‘recognise’ we have made a mistake or we ‘recognise’ the influence of religion on American politics; (2) a form of identification, such as when we ‘recognise’ a friend in the street; and (3) the act of acknowledging or respecting another being, such as when we ‘recognise’ someone’s status, achievements or rights (upon the different meanings of recognition, see Inwood, 1992: 245-47; Margalit, 2001: 128-129). The philosophical and political notion of recognition predominantly refers to (3), and is often taken to mean that not only is recognition an important means of valuing or respecting another person, it is also fundamental to understanding ourselves.

Various attempts have been made to clarify precisely what is, and is not, to count as an act of recognition (perhaps most comprehensively by Ikäheimo and Laitinen, 2007). Ikäheimo (2002: 450) defines recognition as ‘always a case of A taking B as C in the dimension of D, and B taking A as a relevant judge’. Here A and B indicate two individual persons, specifically A is the recogniser and B the recognisee. C designates the attribute recognised in A, and D is the dimension of B’s personhood at stake. For example, I may recognise you as a person possessing certain rights and responsibilities in light of your being an autonomous, rational human being (for more on defining the structure of recognition, see Laitinen, 2002). A key feature of Ikäheimo’s definition is that it requires not only that someone be recognised by another, but that the person being recognised judges that the recogniser is capable of conferring recognition. This means that we must place sufficient value in the recogniser in order for their attitude towards us to count as recognitive. Brandom (2009) approaches this idea through the idea of authority, arguing that a genuine instance of recognition requires that we authorise someone to confer recognition. Similarly, one can gain authority and responsibility by petitioning others for recognition. Consequently, one has authority only insofar as one is recognised as authoritative.

We may not consider being valued by a wilful criminal as any sort of recognition in the sense being defined here. We do not judge them capable of conferring value on us, as we do not accord any value or respect to them. Similarly, someone who is coerced into recognising us may also fail to count as a relevant judge. A king who demands recognition of his superiority from all his subjects, simply in virtue of his being king, and threatens to punish them if they disobey, does not receive any meaningful kind of recognition for the subjects do not genuinely choose to confer value on him. Thus, in recognising another, we must also be recognised as a subject capable of giving recognition. This indicates that reciprocity or mutuality is likely to be a necessary condition of appropriate recognition (for a discussion of this point, see Laden, 2007).

A further issue in defining recognition is whether it is generative or responsive (Laitinen, 2002; Markell, 2007). A generation-model of recognition focuses on the ways in which recognition produces or generates reasons for actions or self-understandings. This is to say that someone ought to act in a certain way in virtue of being recognised as, for example, recognising someone as a rational being will generate certain duties and responsibilities for both the person being recognised and those who interact with him. A response-model of recognition focuses on the ways in which recognition acknowledges pre-existing features of a person. Here, to recognise someone is to acknowledge them as they already really are (Appiah, 1994: 149). This means that there are reasons why one ought to give recognition to someone prior to the act of recognition itself. Thus, for example, we ought to recognise someone’s ability to self-determination because they possess certain features, such as rational autonomy. The demand for recognition in a response-model is produced and justified through pre-existing characteristics of a person, whilst in the generation-model it is the act of recognition itself which confers those characteristics onto a person through their being recognised as such. The former is a case of person ‘knowing’, whilst the latter is a case of person ‘making’ (see Markell, 2002).

A third issue is whether groups or collectives can count as recognisers and recognisees. For example, when speaking of recognising a particular cultural group, do we mean we recognise that group qua a group, or as a collection of individuals? Similarly, does the granting of certain rights or respect apply to the group itself or the individual members belonging to that group? (For a detailed discussion and defence of group-differentiated minority rights, see Kymlicka, 1995). These questions revolve, at least in part, around the ontological status afforded to groups or collectives. Advocates of a politics of recognition are not always clear regarding whether or not groups can be granted recognition. Debates over the legitimacy or sovereignty of a state may depend upon the extent to which we recognise it as legitimate or sovereign. Important discussions of groups as entities include Tuomela (2007), Jones (2009) and List and Pettit (2011). However, as yet there has been little analysis of the connection between recognition and the ontology of groups. Charles Taylor (1994) argues for the importance of collective rights, but gives little consideration to whether collectives are genuine subjects over-and-above the individuals that constitute them. In his more recent work, Axel Honneth (Fraser and Honneth 2003: 159ff.) appears to give consideration to the possibility of groups as the object of recognition, but his general emphasis is on individual rights and recognition.

Common to all social and political notions of recognition is the shift from an atomistic to an intersubjective, dialogical understanding of the individual. Because our identity is shaped precisely through our relations to others, our being recognised by them, feelings of self-worth, self-respect and self-esteem are possible only if we are positively recognised for who we are. To this extent, theories of political recognition, which were first formulated in the 1990s, developed out of political movements centred upon such concepts as gender, sexuality, race, ethnicity and culture. Recognition, according to Taylor (1994), is an indispensible means of understanding and justifying the demands of these identity movements, which have had a major impact on society, particularly from the 1960s onwards. Consequently, for many political theorists, recognition is an integral component of any satisfactory modern theory of justice as well as the means by which both historical and contemporary political struggles can be understood and justified. In order to understand how such theories developed, it is necessary to examine their genesis within Hegel’s philosophy.

2. The Hegelian Legacy

Descartes’ dualistic philosophy of consciousness created an influential legacy in which the mind was characterised as a private theatre and knowledge of the self was achieved through introspection. This atomistic conception of self, encapsulated in Descartes’ cogito, filtered into the transcendental idealism of Kant (despite his objections to Descartes’ philosophy) and the transcendental phenomenology of Husserl, as well as being present in the contract theories of Hobbes and Locke. Against this trend there emerged a strongly intersubjective conception of selfhood that found expression through the concept of recognition, the founder of which is typically identified as Hegel. Although Hegel has undoubtedly influenced the contemporary understanding of recognition more than any other philosopher, Hegel was himself inspired by the work of Johann Fichte (see Williams, 1992). In his Foundations of Natural Right (1796/7), Fichte argues that the ‘I’ (the ego or pure consciousness) must posit itself as an individual to be able to understand itself as a free self. In order for such self-positing to occur, the individual must recognise itself as ‘summoned’ by another individual. This is to say, the individual must acknowledge the claims of other free individuals in order to understand itself as a being capable of action and possessing freedom. Hence, one’s freedom is both rendered possible and yet limited by the demands made on us by others. A key feature of this idea is that the same applies in reverse – the other can only comprehend itself as free by being recognised as such. Hence, mutual recognition is necessary for human beings to understand themselves as free individuals (as beings capable of ‘I-hood’). Through this analysis, Fichte produced a thoroughly intersubjective ontology of humans and demonstrated that freedom and self-understanding are dependent upon mutual recognition.

These ideas were developed in greater detail by Hegel. In his Phenomenology of Spirit Hegel (1807: 229) writes, ‘Self-consciousness exists in itself and for itself, in that, and by the fact that it exists for another self-consciousness; that is to say, it is only by being acknowledged or “recognized”’. Self-knowledge, including one’s sense of freedom and sense of self, is never a matter of simple introspection. Rather, understanding ourselves as an independent self-consciousness requires the recognition of another. One must recognise oneself as mediated through the other. As Sartre, who was heavily influenced by Hegel, wrote, ‘The road of interiority passes through the Other’ (Sartre, 1943: 236-7). The idea of recognition is developed further in Hegel’s mature works, particularly Elements of the Philosophy of Right (1821), where it becomes an essential factor in the development of ethical life (sittlichkeit). According to Hegel, it is through the intersubjective recognition of our freedom that right is actualised. Rights are not instrumental to freedom; rather they are the concrete expression of it. Without recognition we could not come to realise freedom, which in turn gives rise to right. The work of Hegel consciously echoes the Aristotelian conception of humans as essentially social beings. For Hegel, recognition is the mechanism by which our existence as social beings is generated. Therefore, our successful integration as ethical and political subjects within a particular community is dependent upon receiving (and conferring) appropriate forms of recognition.

The part of Hegel’s work to lay bare certain fundamental dynamics involved in recognition is the oft-discussed master-slave dialectic which appears in the Phenomenology (see Pinkard, 1996: 46ff; Stern, 2002: 83ff.). Hegel introduces the idea of a ‘struggle for recognition’, describing an encounter between two self-consciousnesses which both seek to affirm the certainty of their being for themselves (Hegel, 1807: 232ff.). Such a conflict is described as a life-and-death struggle, insofar as each consciousness desires to confirm its self-existence and independence through a negation or objectification of the other. That is, it seeks to incorporate the other within its field of consciousness as an object of negation, as something which this consciousness is not, thus affirming its own unfettered existence. Of course, the other also tries to negate this consciousness, thus generating the struggle which results in affirmation of one self-consciousness at the cost of the negation or annihilation of the other. Only in this way, Hegel observes, only by risking life, can freedom be obtained. However, there is a key moment with this struggle. Namely, consciousness realises that it cannot simply destroy the other through incorporating it within itself, for it requires the other as a definite other in order to gain recognition. Thus, it must resist collapsing the other into itself, for to do so would also be to annihilate itself. It would be starving itself of the recognition it requires in order to be a determinate self-consciousness.

Within Hegel’s radical reworking of how the individual subject is understood, autonomy becomes a contingent, social and practical accomplishment; it is an intersubjectively-mediated achievement which is never simply given or guaranteed but always dependent upon our relations with others. This co-dependency results in mutual relations of recognition which are the condition for understanding oneself as a genuinely free being, albeit a free being which acknowledges, and thus adjusts itself, to the freedom of others. Discussing the process of recognition, Hegel (1807: 230) notes that it ‘is absolutely the double process of both self-consciousnesses… Action from one side only would be useless, because what is to happen can only be brought about by means of both’. As a result, these two self-consciousnesses ‘recognize themselves as mutually recognizing one another’ (ibid: 231). Hegel characterises this mutuality, which cannot be coerced but be freely given and received, as being at home in the other. Such a relation with another is the condition for the phenomenological experience of freedom and right. Consequently, our interactions with others are not a limitation on freedom, but rather the ‘enhancement and concrete actualization of freedom’ (Williams, 1997: 59).

We see now how the master-slave dialectic of recognition is inherently unstable and unsatisfying. The master has dominion over the slave, reducing the latter to the status of a mere ‘thing’ through refusing to recognise it as a free and equal self-consciousness. The slave, realising that life as a slave is better than no life at all, accepts this relation of dominance and subservience. Whilst the slave receives no recognition from the master, the master has ‘earned’ the recognition of a slave which it considers as less-than-human. Such recognition is not ‘real’ recognition at all and yet, within this Hegel’s dialectic of recognition, the master requires the recognition of the slave in order to gain some modicum of self-understanding and freedom. The recognition of the slave is ultimately worthless, for it is not the recognition of a free self-consciousness, which alone can grant the recognition on another required for self-certainty of existence and freedom. Trapped in this fruitless relation, the slave becomes the ‘truth’ of the master, and so the master, paradoxically, becomes enslaved to the slave. For Hegel, relations of domination provide a vicious spiral of recognition. They lead nowhere but to their own destruction. Hence recognition must always take place between equals, mediated through social institutions which can guarantee that equality and thus produce the necessary mutual relations of recognition necessary for the attainment of freedom. It is precisely this last point that recent recognition theorists have seized upon and elaborated into comprehensive discussions of justice.

3. Contemporary Theories of Recognition

a. Charles Taylor

Much contemporary interest in recognition was undoubtedly fuelled by Charles Taylor’s essay ‘Multiculturalism and the Politics of Recognition’ (1994), first published in 1992. Taylor’s lucid and concise article is often treated as the classic expression of a theory of recognition. However, it would be more accurate to say that Taylor awoke a general interest in the idea of recognition. His short essay provides a series of reflections and conjectures which, whilst insightful, do not constitute a full-blown theory of recognition. However, its exploratory nature and non-technical language has helped install it as the common reference point for discussions of recognition.

Taylor begins with the assertion that ‘a number of strands in contemporary politics turn on the need, sometimes the demand, for recognition’ (Taylor, 1994: 25). He identifies such a demand as present in the political activities of feminism, race movements and multiculturalists (for a critical discussion of this point, see Nicholson, 1996). The specific importance of recognition lies in its relationship to identity, which he defines as ‘a person’s understanding of who they are, of their fundamental characteristics as a human being’ (Taylor, 1994: 25). Because identity is ‘partly shaped by recognition or its absence’, then ‘Nonrecognition or misrecognition can inflict harm, can be a form of oppression, imprisoning someone in a false, distorted, and reduced mode of being’ (ibid.). Underlying Taylor’s model is the Hegelian belief that individuals are formed intersubjectively (see Section II). Our individual identity is not constructed from within and generated by each of us alone. Rather, it is through dialogue with others that we negotiate our identity. Taylor refers to these others as ‘significant others’, meaning those people who have an important role in our lives (that is, family, friends, teachers, colleagues, and so forth.). The idea that our sense of who we are is determined through our interaction with others initiates a shift from a monologic to a dialogic model of the self.

Taylor is keen to stress just how important recognition is, referring to it as ‘a vital human need’ (ibid: 26) and stating that misrecognition ‘can inflict a grievous wound, saddling its victims with a crippling self-hatred’ (ibid: 26). Deploying a brief historical narrative, Taylor argues that the collapse of social hierarchies, which had provided the basis for bestowing honour on certain individuals (that is, those high up on the social ladder), led to the modern day notion of dignity, which rests upon universalist and egalitarian principles regarding the equal worth of all human beings. This notion of dignity lies at the core of contemporary democratic ideals, unlike the notion of honour which is, he claims, clearly incompatible with democratic culture. This picture is complicated by the fact that alongside this development of dignity there emerged also a new understanding of ‘individualised identity’, one in which the emphasis was on each person’s uniqueness, which Taylor defines as ‘being true to myself and my own particular way of being’ (ibid: 28). Taylor refers to this idea of uniqueness as the ideal of authenticity, writing ‘Being true to myself means being true to my own originality, which is something only I can articulate and discover. In articulating it, I am also defining myself’ (ibid: 31).

Taylor has been accused of adopting an essentialist view of the self, on the basis that there is some inner ‘me’ waiting to be uncovered and displayed to (recognised by) the world (see section V. b). However, he is quick to point out that the discovery of our authenticity is not simply a matter of introspection. Rather, it is through our interactions with others that we define who we are. Nor is there an end point to this dialogue. It continues throughout our entire lives and does not even depend upon the physical presence of a specific other for that person to influence us. Consider, for example, the way an imaginary conversation with a deceased partner might influence how we act or view ourselves. The importance of recognition lies precisely in the fact that how others see (might) us is a necessary step in forming an understanding of who we are. To be recognised negatively, or misrecognised, is to be thwarted in our desire for authenticity and self-esteem.

Taylor’s uses these insights to construct a politics of equal recognition. He identifies two different ways in which the idea of equal recognition has been understood. The first is a politics of equal dignity, or a politics of universalism, which aims at the equalisation of all rights and entitlements. In this instance, all individuals are to be treated as universally the same through recognition of their common citizenship or humanity. The second formulation is the politics of difference, in which the uniqueness of each individual or group is recognised. Rousseau bitterly noted that man, having shifted from a state of self-sufficiency and simplicity to one of competition and domination that characterises modern society, has come to crave the recognition of their difference (Rousseau, 1754). In this detrimental situation, man is rendered dependent upon the views of others, craving what Rousseau termed ‘amour propre’ through the admiration of those around him, leading to an endless competition for greater achievements and respect and thus robbing man of his independence. For Rousseau, this desire for individual distinction, achievement and recognition conflicts with a principle of equal respect

Returning to Taylor, he notes that there is also a universal basis to this second political model insofar as all people are entitled to have their identity recognised: ‘we give due acknowledgement only to what is universally present – everyone has an identity – through recognizing what is peculiar to each. The universal demand powers an acknowledgement of specificity’ (Taylor, 1994: 39). One consequence of this politics of difference is that certain rights will be assigned to specific groups but not others. The two approaches can be summed as follows. The politics of equal dignity is difference-blind, whereas the politics of difference is, as the name suggests, difference-friendly (this does not mean that a politics of equal dignity is not also ‘friendly’ towards difference, but rather that differences between individuals cannot be the normative foundation for the assignment of certain rights or entitlement to some individuals or groups but not others).

Taylor defends a politics of difference, arguing that the concept of equal dignity often (if not always) derives its idea of what rights and entitlement are worth having from the perspective of the hegemonic culture, thus enforcing minority groups to conform to the expectations of dominant culture and hence relinquish their particularity. Failure to conform will result in the minority culture being derided and ostracised by the dominant culture. As Taylor (ibid: 66) notes, ‘dominant groups tend to entrench their hegemony by inculcating an image of inferiority in the subjugated’. A clear instance of this can be seen in de Beauvoir’s claim that woman is always defined as man’s ‘other’ or ‘shadow’ (de Beauvoir, 1949). Woman exists as a lack; characterised through what she does not possess or exhibit (namely, male and masculine traits). Similarly, civil rights movements have frequently protested that the image of the ‘human’ was inevitably white, Western, educated, middle-class and wealthy. An example of how this plays out in everyday life is the recent, though now generally discarded, practice of labelling pink crayons ‘flesh’ coloured. Both feminist and race theorists have tried to convey the idea that the white male is simply another particular instance of humanity, rather than its ‘default’ image or constitutive, universal norm. This point was strongly made by Fanon (1952), who detailed how racism infiltrates the consciousness of the oppressed, preventing psychological health through the internalisation of subjection and otherness. This in turn alienates the black person from both their society and their own body, owing to the fact that the world is defined in terms of ‘whiteness’ and thus as something essentially irretrievably different (alien) to them.

b. Axel Honneth

Axel Honneth has produced arguably the most extensive discussion of recognition to date. He is in agreement with Taylor that recognition is essential to self-realisation. However, he draws more explicitly on Hegelian intersubjectivity in order to identify the mechanics of how this is achieved, as well as establishing the motivational and normative role recognition can play in understanding and justifying social movements. Following Hegel (1807; 1821) and Mead (1934), Honneth identifies three ‘spheres of interaction’ which are connected to the three ‘patterns of recognition’ necessary for an individual’s development of a positive relation-to-self. These are love, rights, and solidarity (Honneth, 1995: 92ff; also Honneth 2007, 129-142).

The mode of recognition termed ‘love’ refers to our physical needs and emotions being met by others and takes the form of our primary relationships (that is, close friends, family and lovers). It provides a basic self-confidence, which can be shattered through physical abuse. The mode of recognition termed ‘rights’ refers to the development of moral responsibility, developed through our moral relations with others. It is a mutual mode of recognition ‘in which the individual learns to see himself from the perspective of his [or her] partner in interaction as a bearer of equal rights’ (Honneth, 1992: 194). The denial of rights through social and legal exclusion can threaten one’s sense of being a fully active, equal and respected member of society. Finally, the mode of recognition termed ‘solidarity’ relates to recognition of our traits and abilities. It is essential for developing our self-esteem and for how we become ‘individualised’, for it is precisely our personal traits and abilities that define our personal difference (Honneth, 1995: 122). Consequently, unlike the relations of love and rights, which express universal features of human subjects, esteem ‘demands a social medium that must be able to express the characteristic differences between human subjects in a universal, and more specifically, intersubjectively obligatory way’ (ibid.). All three spheres of recognition are crucial to developing a positive attitude towards oneself:

For it is only due to the cumulative acquisition of basic self-confidence, of self-respect, and of self-esteem… that a person can come to see himself or herself, unconditionally, as both an autonomous and an individuated being and to identify with his or her goals and desires (ibid: 169).

According to Honneth, the denial of recognition provides the motivational and justificatory basis for social struggles. Specifically, it is through the emotional experiences generated by certain attitudes and actions of others towards us that we can come to feel we are being illegitimately denied social recognition. This argument makes use of Dewey’s theory of emotion as intentionally orientated. Certain emotional states, such as shame, anger and frustration, are generated by the failure of our actions. Conversely, more positive emotional states are generated through successful action. The experience of negative emotional states can, in theory, reveal to us that an injustice is taking place (namely, that we are not being given due and appropriate recognition). However, as Honneth points out, feelings of shame or anger need not (indeed, do not) necessarily disclose relations of disrespect (ibid: 138). What they provide is the potential for identifying the occurrence of an injustice which one is justified in opposing. The experience of disrespect is the raw material from which normatively justified social struggles can be formulated. Furthermore, it is only within certain social contexts, those in which the ‘means of articulation of a social movement are available’ (ibid: 139), that experiences of disrespect provide the motivational basis for political struggles (see Honneth, 2007). Presumably, disrespect in other contexts would lead to individual acts of retaliation or undirected violence, rather than coordinated resistance.

This phenomenological approach to recognition thus locates the source and justification of social struggles in the experiences and expectations of recognition. Of course, as noted, it requires the further steps of (a) locating these experiences within a socially-generated framework of emancipatory discourse; and (b) the establishment of common experiences amongst individuals for these individual frustrations to develop into social struggles. Therefore, it would be naïve to think that Honneth is blind to the importance of, say, ensuring the means and rights to collective political action within societies. But the fundamental component of any attempt to identify injustice and vindicate the necessary remedies must be located in the individual’s experiences of disrespect (Honneth, 2007) (for a potential problem with this position, see Rogers, 2009).

In order to justify these claims, Honneth ascribes an inherent expectation of recognition to humans, referring to demands generated from such an expectation as the ‘“quasi-transcendental interests” of the human race’ (Fraser and Honneth, 2003: 174). It is only through the failure of such expectations that recognition can be a motivational source, arising via negative emotional experiences. This assumption allows Honneth to assess societal change as a developmental process driven by moral claims arising from experiences of disrespect. Honneth (1995: 168) summarises his somewhat teleological account (a product of Honneth’s Hegelian and Aristotelian tendencies) as follows: ‘Every unique, historical struggle or conflict only reveals its position within the development of society once its role in the establishment of moral progress, in terms of recognition, has been grasped’.

The positing of an approximate and ideal end-state, presumably one in which full recognition reigns supreme, allows a distinction between progressive, emancipatory struggles and those which are reactionary and / or oppressive. Therefore, from this general position of enabling the self-realisation of one’s desires, characteristics and abilities, we can assess current socio-political struggles and analyse their future directions so as to ensure their promoting of the conditions for self-realisation. Honneth is careful to specify that he is not advocating a single, substantive set of universal values and social arrangements. Rather, his concept of ‘the good’ is concerned with the ‘structural elements of ethical life’ which enable personal integrity (ibid: 172). Therefore, the posited ‘end-point’ from which normative claims can be made must emanate from structural relations outlined in the three distinct patterns of recognition which foster a positive relation-to-self (for a discussion of Honneth’s conception of the good / ethical life, see Zurn, 2000). Here, Honneth is trying to retain a Kantian notion of respect and autonomy through identifying the necessary conditions for self-realisation and self-determination, akin to a Kantian kingdom of ends in which all individuals receive and confer recognition on one another. Simultaneously, in stressing the minimal or ‘bare’ conditions necessary for this, he aims to avoid committing himself to a singular, substantial conception of the good life and thus resists the dangers of reproducing an exclusivist and exclusionary conception of what constitutes the good life.

c. Nancy Fraser

Whereas there are broad areas of agreement between Honneth and Taylor, Nancy Fraser is keen to differentiate her theory of recognition from both of their respective positions. Fraser’s overarching theme throughout her works on recognition is the dissolving of the assumed antithesis between redistribution and recognition (arguably this assumption is a consequence of critical theory’s Marxist roots, within which framework Fraser’s work undoubtedly emerges from). Thus far, the presentation of recognition and redistribution has been presented (at least implicitly) as an either/or decision. Fraser believes that this binary opposition derives from the fact that, whereas recognition seems to promote differentiation, redistribution supposedly works to eliminate it. The recognition paradigm seems to target cultural injustice, which is rooted in the way people’s identities are positively or negatively valued. Individuals exist as members of a community based upon a shared horizon of meanings, norms and values. Conversely, the distribution paradigm targets economic injustice, which is rooted in one’s relation to the market or the means of production (Fraser and Honneth, 2003: 14). Here, individuals exist in a hierarchically-differentiated collective class system which, from the perspective of the majority class who are constituted by a lack of resources, needs abolishing.

According to Fraser, both these forms of injustice are primary and co-original, meaning that economic inequality cannot be reduced to cultural misrecognition, and vice-versa. Many social movements face this dilemma of having to balance the demand for (economic) equality with the insistence that their (cultural) specificity be met. Fraser (1997: 19) gives the example of the feminist movement by posing the question, ‘How can feminists fight simultaneously to abolish gender differentiation [through economic redistribution] and to valorize gender specificity [through cultural recognition]?’. There is a clear divergence here between the monistic models of Taylor and Honneth, in which recognition is the foundational category of social analysis and distribution is treated as derivative, and Fraser’s dualistic model. Whereas Honneth thinks a sufficiently elaborated concept of recognition can do all the work needed for a critical theory of justice, Fraser argues that recognition is but one dimension of justice, albeit a vitally important one.

The disagreement over whether or not distribution can be made to supervene on recognition arises from the differing interpretations of recognition. According to Fraser (Fraser and Honneth 2003: 29), one can understand recognition as either (a) a matter of justice, connected to with the concept of a universal ‘right’ (Fraser’s position); or (b) a matter of self-realisation, connected with historically-relative cultural conceptions of the ‘good’ (Honneth’s and Taylor’s position). In (b) Fraser draws out the Aristotelian idea of eudaimonia (flourishing), which runs throughout Honneth’s teleological account. Contra Honneth and Taylor, Fraser does not look to situate the injustice of misrecognition in the retardation of personal development. Rather, she identifies it with the fact that ‘some individuals and groups are denied the status of full partners in social interaction simply as a consequence of institutionalized patterns of cultural value in whose construction they have not equally participated and which disparage their distinctive characteristics or the distinctive characteristics assigned to them’ (ibid). Addressing injustices arising from misrecognition therefore means looking at the discursive representations of identities in order to identity how certain individuals are assigned a relatively inferior social standing. Hence, on Fraser’s model, misrecognition should not be construed as an impediment to ethical self-realization (as it is for Taylor and Honneth). Instead, it should be conceived as an institutionalised relation of subordination.

Owing to her identification of recognition with social status, the evaluative element in Fraser’s account is the notion of ‘parity of participation’. According to this principle, ‘justice requires that social arrangements permit all (adult) members of society to interact with one another as peer’ (ibid: 36). In effect, recognition is required in order to guarantee that all members of society have an equal participation in social life. Crucially, participatory parity also requires material / economic redistribution in order to guarantee that people are independent and ‘have a voice’ (ibid). Because Honneth equates recognition with self-realisation, the derivative issues of redistribution are only generated to the extent that they inhibit this personal development. For Fraser, injustice in the form of both misrecognition and maldistribution is detrimental to the extent that it inhibits participatory parity.

Fraser considers two possible remedies for injustice, which transcend the redistribution-recognition divide by being applicable to both. The first is ‘affirmation’, which incorporates any action which corrects ‘inequitable outcomes of social arrangements without disturbing the underlying framework that generates them’ (ibid: 23). The second is ‘transformation’, which refers to ‘remedies aimed at correcting inequitable outcomes precisely by restricting the underlying generative framework’ (ibid). Fraser’s concept of transformation highlights her belief that certain forms of injustice are ingrained within ‘institutionalized patterns of cultural value’ (ibid: 46). Certain forms of inequality, including those of race and gender, derive from the signifying effect of socio-cultural structures. These discursive frameworks, situated within language and social arrangements, reproduce hierarchical binary oppositions such as ‘heterosexual/homosexual’, ‘white/black’ and ‘man/woman’. Thus, the solution is not simply a matter of revaluing heterosexual, female or black identities. Rather, one must attempt to deconstruct the binary logic which situates people as inherently inferior, creating a ‘field of multiple, debinarized, fluid, ever-shifting differences’ (Fraser, 1997: 24). One key aspect of this transformative approach is that, unlike the affirmative approach which aims to alter only one particular group’s sense of worth or material situation, it would change everyone’s sense of self. The proposal made by Fraser, then, is the radical restructuring of society, achieved through transformative redistribution (that is, socialism) and recognition (cultural deconstruction). It should be noted that in her more recent work on recognition (that is, Fraser 2000; 2001), she resists offering any particular remedies, arguing instead that the required response to injustice will be dictated by the specific context. Thus, she appears to distance herself from the more ‘deconstructive’ elements of her earlier work (see Zurn, 2003).

4. Redistribution or Recognition? The Fraser-Honneth Debate

In a very important discussion, Fraser and Honneth (2003) defend their respective theories of recognition (see also Honneth, 2001). Underlying the disagreements between them is their respective positions regarding the distribution / recognition debate. As noted in Section III, Fraser believes that recognition and distribution are two irreducible elements of a satisfactory theory of justice. This is to say, they are of equal foundational importance – the one cannot be collapsed into the other. Honneth, on the other hand, contends that issues of distribution are ultimately explained and justified through issues of recognition. As he writes, ‘questions of distributive justice are better understood in terms of normative categories that come from a sufficiently differentiated theory of recognition’ (ibid: 126). He begins justifying this claim through a historical survey of political movements and unrest amongst the lower classes during the early stages of capitalism. What marked such activities was the commonly held belief that the honour and dignity of the members of the lower classes were not being adequately respected. Summarising these findings, Honneth (ibid: 132) proclaims that ‘subjects perceive institutional procedures as social injustice when they see aspects of their personality being disrespected which they believe they have a right to recognition’.

One important consequence of this view is that it undermines the received wisdom that collective identity movements are a recent ‘modern’ phenomenon. In actual fact, according to Honneth, experiences of disrespect and denigration of an individual’s or group’s identity are the constitutive feature of all instances of social discontent. Portraying ‘recognition’ as the sole preserve of cultural minorities struggling for social respect is therefore highly misleading and obscures the fact that challenges to the existing social order are always driven by the moral experience of failing to receive what is deemed to be sufficient recognition (ibid: 160). Any dispute regarding redistribution of wealth or resources is reducible to a claim over the social valorisation of specific group or individual traits. The feminist struggle over the gendered division of labour is, according to Honneth, primarily a struggle regarding the prevailing assessment of achievement and worth which has had important redistributive effects, such as a trend towards greater access to, and equality within, the workplace and the acknowledgement of ‘female’ housework. The division that Fraser makes between economic distribution and cultural recognition is, Honneth claims, an arbitrary and ultimately misleading one that ignores the fundamental role played by recognition in economic struggles, as well as implying that the cultural sphere of society can be understood as functioning independently of the economic sphere.

Fraser (ibid: 30ff.) offers four advantages of her status model over Honneth’s monistic vision of justice as due recognition (for a discussion of these, see Zurn, 2003). Arguably the most important of these is that, in locating injustice in social relations governed by cultural patterns of representations, she can move beyond both Taylor’s and Honneth’s reliance on psychology as the normative force underlying struggles for recognition. Recalling that Honneth locates the experiences of injustice in the emotional responses to frustrated expectations of due recognition, Fraser argues that she is able to ‘show that a society whose institutionalized norms impede parity of participation is morally indefensible whether or not they distort the subjectivity of the oppressed’ (ibid: 32). The ideal of participatory parity gives Fraser her normative component, for it provides the basis on which different recognition claims can be judged. Namely, a valid recognition claim is one in which subjects can show that ‘institutionalized patterns of cultural value deny them the necessary intersubjective conditions [for participatory parity]’ (ibid: 38). Honneth’s invocation of pre-political suffering, generated by the perceived withholding of recognition, as the motivating force behind social movements is thus rejected by Fraser as seriously problematic. In particular, she says, the idea that all social discontent has the same, single underlying motivation (misrecognition) is simply implausible. Honneth rejects other motivational factors such as ‘resentment of unearned privilege, abhorrence of cruelty, aversion of arbitrary power… antipathy to exploitation, dislike of supervision’ that cannot not simply be reduced down to, or subsumed by, an overarching expectation of appropriate recognition.

Another problem with Honneth’s psychological model of experiences of injustice is that, so Fraser argues, it shifts the focus away from society and onto the self, thus ‘implanting an excessively personalized sense of injury’ (ibid: 204). This can lead to the victim of oppression internalising the injustice or blaming themselves, rather than the discursive and material conditions within which they are situated as oppressed or harmed. Indeed, Fraser proceeds to point out that there can be no ‘pure’ experience of moral indignation caused by withheld or inappropriate recognition. There is no realm of personal experience that is not experienced through a particular linguistic and historical horizon, which actively shapes the experience in question (see section V. d). Thus to introduce a ‘primordial’ sense of moral suffering is, Fraser claims, simply incoherent (similar concerns are raised by McNay, 2008: 138ff.). Honneth cannot invoke psychological experiences of disrespect as the normative foundation for his theory of recognition as they cannot be treated as independent of the discursive conditions within which the subject is constituted. To do so is to rely on an ultimately unjustifiable transcendental account of the subject’s access to their sense of moral worth grounded in the right to recognition.

In his response to Fraser, Honneth points out that she can necessarily focus only on those social movements that have already become visible. By analysing the ways in which individuals and groups are socially-situated by institutionalised patterns of cultural value, Fraser limits herself to only those expressions of social discontent that have already entered the public sphere. The logic of this criticism seems to be that, if (in)justice is a matter of how society signifies subjects’ abilities and characteristics, then it can only address those collective subjectivities which are currently socially recognised. In other words, there could be a plethora of individuals and groups who are struggling for recognition which have not yet achieved public acknowledgement and thus have not been implicated within positive or negative social structures of signification. There appears some weight to this criticism, for a successful critical social theory should be able to not only critique the status quo, but identify future patterns of social resistance. If, on Fraser’s account, justice is a matter of addressing how subjects are socially-situated by existing value structures, then it seems to lack the conceptual apparatus to look beyond the present. The ability to identify social discontent must, Honneth argues, be constructed independently of social recognition, and therefore ‘requires precisely the kind of moral-psychological considerations Fraser seeks to avoid’ (ibid: 125). In ignoring the individual’s experiences of injustice as the disrespect of aspects of their personality, a social theory can only address the present situation, rather than exploring the normative directions of future social struggles. It is out of the frustration of individual expectations of due recognition that new social movements will emanate, rather than the pre-existing patterns of signification which currently hierarchically situate subjects.

5. Criticisms of Recognition

Despite its influence and popularity, there are a number of concerns regarding the concept of recognition as a foundational element in a theory of justice. This article cannot hope to present an exhaustive list, so instead offers a few of the most common critiques.

a. The Reification of Identity

Perhaps the one most frequently voiced criticism is that regarding the reification of group identity. Put simply, the concern is that, in initiating an identity politics in which one demands positive recognition for a group’s specific characteristics, specific characteristics can be seen as necessarily constitutive of this group and thus any group member who does not display these characteristics risks being ostracised. Such claims are often cloaked in a language of ‘authenticity’ which leads to demands for conformity amongst individual members of the group in order to gain acceptance and approval. This risks producing intergroup coercion and enforcing conformity at the expense of individual specificity.

To give an example, discussed by Appiah (1994) in his response to Taylor’s essay on recognition, the construction of a black politics in which black identity is celebrated can provide a sense of self-worth and dignity amongst historically denigrated black communities. However, it can also lead to a ‘proper’ way of being black, one which all members of the black community must demonstrate in order to partake in this positive self-image. Such expectations of behaviour can lead, Appiah notes (ibid: 163), to one form of tyranny being replaced by another. Specifically, individuals who fail to exemplify authentic ‘black’ identity can find themselves once again the victims of intolerance and social exclusion. Similar dynamics of exclusion can be seen in the debate within certain feminist circles about whether lesbians can be properly considered ‘women’. Extrapolating from these concerns, Markell (2003) argues that Taylor conflates individual identity with group identity with the result that agency is rendered a matter of adopting the identity one is assigned through membership of one’s community. Consequently, the critical tension between the individual and community is dissolved, which leaves little (if any) space for critiquing or resisting the dominant norms and values of one’s community (see also Habermas, 1991: 271).

The reification of group identity can also lead to separatism through generating an ‘us-and-them’ group mentality. By valorising a particular identity, those other identities which lack certain characteristics particular to the group in question can be dismissed as inferior. This isolationist policy runs counter to the ideal of social acceptability and respect for difference that a politics of recognition is meant to initiate. Reifying group identity prevents critical dialogue taking place either within or between groups. Internal group members who challenge apparently ‘authentic’ aspects of their culture or group identity can be labelled as traitors, whilst non-group members are dismissed as unqualified to comment on the characteristics of the group on the basis that they are ‘outsiders’. The result is a strong separatism and radical relativism in which intergroup dialogue is eliminated. This can mask over the ways in which various axes of identity overlap and thus ignores the commonalities between groups. For example, the focus of black feminists on ‘black culture’ and the oppression this has suffered can lead to a failure to recognise their commonality with women in other cultures. Conversely, the tendency among feminists to focus on the concept of ‘woman’ can lead them to ignore the potential alliances they might share with other oppressed groups that don’t focus on gender injustice. Underlying this critique is the idea that identity is always multilayered and that each individual is always positioned at the intersection of multiple axes of oppression. Simply reducing one’s sense of oppression to a single feature of identity (such as race or gender) fails to acknowledge the way that each feature of identity is inextricably bound up with other features, so that, for example, race and gender cannot be treated as analytically distinct modes of dominance.

b. The Accusation of Essentialism

Similar to the concerns over reification, there is a concern that recognition theories invoke an essentialist account of identity. This has particularly been the case with regards Taylor’s model of recognition (see McNay, 2008: 64ff). Critics accuse recognition theory of assuming that there is a kernel of selfhood that awaits recognition (see, for example, Heyes, 2003). The struggle for recognition thus becomes a struggle to be recognised as what one truly is. This implies that certain features of a person lie dormant, awaiting discovery by the individual who then presents this authentic self to the world and demands positive recognition for it. Although Taylor is keen to stress that his model is not committed to such an essentialist account of the self, certain remarks he makes do not help his cause. For example, in describing the modern view of how we create a sense of ‘full being’, he notes that, rather than connecting with some source outside of ourselves (such as God or the Platonic Good), ‘the source we have to connect with is deep within us. This fact is part of the massive subjective turn of modern culture, a new form of inwardness, in which we come to think our ourselves as beings with hidden depths’ (Taylor, 1994: 29). Taylor proceeds to note that ‘Being true to myself means being true to my own originality, which is something only I can articulate and discover’ (ibid: 31) and that authenticity ‘calls on me to discover my own original way of being. By definition, this way of being cannot be socially derived, but must be inwardly generated’ (ibid: 32).

A more radical account of intersubjectivity can be found in Arendt (1958). Examining the processes by which the subject reveals who they are, she shifts the focus away from a personal revelation on the part of the agent and into the social realm: ‘it is more than likely that the “who” , which appears so clearly and unmistakably to others, remains hidden from the person itself, like the daimōn in Greek religion which accompanies each man throughout his life, always looking over his shoulder from behind and thus visible only to those he encounters’ (Arendt, 1958: 179-80). One important consequence of this idea is that, in order to address the question of ‘who’ we are, we must be willing to relinquish control of any such answer. In so doing, we place ourselves into the hands of others. As Arendt writes, ‘This unpredictability of outcome [of personal disclosure] is closely related to the revelatory character of action and speech, in which one discloses one’s self without ever either knowing himself or being able to calculate beforehand whom he reveals’ (ibid: 192) (for an Arendt-inspired critique of recognition, see Markell, 2003).

c. The Danger of Subjectivism

Taylor mitigates his position and, arguably, eschews any form of essentialism, by arguing that we always work out our identity through dialogue with others. However, there is a possibility that he slips towards a subjectivist position, for it seems that it is the individual who ultimately decides what their ‘true’ identity is. For example, Taylor (1994: 32-3) states that this dialogue with others requires that we struggle with and sometimes struggle against the things that others want to see in us. However, he does not state to what we appeal to in this potential struggle with others. If it is ultimately our sense of who we are, then this would seem to undermine the very conditions of intersubjectivity that Taylor wants to introduce into the notion of personal identity. For, if one is the ultimate judge and jury on who one is, then those around us will simply be agreeing or disagreeing with our pre-existent or inwardly-generated sense of self, rather than playing an ineliminable role in its constitution.

Again, it is unlikely that Taylor would endorse any form of subjectivism. Indeed, his turn towards intersubjective recognition is precisely meant to resist the idea that one simply decides who one is and demands that others recognise oneself in such a way. Taylor would certainly seem critical of the existential tradition, which emphasised the need for one to define oneself and provide meaning to the world. Although Sartre deployed the language of intersubjectivity (see V. d) and highlighted the importance of the other, his analysis of the in-itself and the for-itself, coupled with describing how we are each born alone and must carry the weight of the world on our shoulders (with no-one able to lighten the burden), suggests an ego which negates (and hence is radically separated from) the world. This split between ‘I’ and ‘you’ renders any notion of dialogical identity construction impotent.

Recognition, contrasted with this existential picture, theories seem well equipped to resist any accusation that they slide into subjectivism. However, they must provide a criterion from which to judge whether individual and collective demands for recognition are legitimate. For example, it cannot be the case that all demands for recognition are accepted, for we are unlikely to want to recognise the claims of a racist or homophobic group for cultural protection. There is a danger that Taylor’s model does not explicitly state the conditions by which acceptable claims for recognition can be separated from unacceptable claims. His politics of difference is premised on ‘a universal respect for the human capacity to form one’s identity (Taylor, 1994: 42). Hence he seems committed to respecting difference qua difference, regardless of the particular form this difference takes. There is a sense that, as long as recourse is made to an ‘authentic’ life, then the demand for recognition should be met. But no matter how strongly the racist group insists upon their authenticity, we would be likely to resist recognising the value and worth of their identity as racists.

d. The Problem of the Other

Certain theorists have tended to cast recognition in a far more negative, conflictual light. Typically, they interpret Hegelian recognition as evolving an inescapable element of domination between, or appropriation of, subjects. Perhaps the most notable of such thinkers is Sartre (1943), whose account of intersubjectivity appears to preclude any possibility of recognition functioning as a means of attaining political solidarity or emancipation. According to Sartre, our relations with other people are always conflictual as each of us attempts to negate the other in an intersubjective dual. The realisation of our own subjectivity is dependent upon our turning the other into an object. In turn, we are made to feel like an object within the gaze of the other. Sartre’s famous example is the shameful, objectifying experience of suddenly feeling the ‘look’ or ‘gaze’ of another person upon us when carrying out a contemptible act. In this moment of shame, I feel myself as an object and am thus denied existence as a subject. My only hope is to make the other into an object. There are no equal or stable relations between people; all interactions are processes of domination.

Whereas Sartre focuses on the problem of being recognised, Levinas (1961) turns to the ethical issues attending how one recognises others. According to Levinas, Hegelian recognition involves an unavoidable appropriation or assimilation of the other into one’s own subjectivity. By this he means that in recognising the other we render them ‘knowable’ according to our own terms, thus depriving him or her of their irreducible ‘alterity’ or difference. Levinas believes that the denying of such difference is the fundamental ethical sin as it fails to respect the other in their absolute exteriority, their absolute difference to us. In effect, to recognise someone is to render them the same as us; to eliminate their inescapable, unapprehendable and absolute alterity (Yar, 2002).

An alternative perspective on the self-other relationship can be found in Merleau-Ponty who argues that the other is always instigated within oneself, and vice-versa, through the potential reversibility of the self-other dichotomy (that is, that the self is also a potential other; seeing someone necessarily involves the possibility of being seen). Merleau-Ponty explicitly rejects the Levinasian perspective that the other is an irreducible alterity. Rather, the self and other are intertwined through their bodily imbrications in the world. He describes our respective perspectives on the world as slipping into one another and thus being brought together: ‘In reality, the other is not shut up inside my perspective of the world, because this perspective itself has no definite limits, because it slips spontaneously into the other’s’ (Merleau-Ponty, 1945: 411). Consequently, there is no ‘problem’ of the other, for the other is already contained within our being, as we are within theirs. This resonates with Heidegger’s characterisation of Being (Dasein) as being-with-others. We are always already alongside others, bound up in relations of mutuality that prevent any strict ontological distinction between self, other and world.

The Levinasian and Sartrean accounts of the self-other relationship can be criticised from a hermeneutic perspective for failing to acknowledge the fact that understanding is essentially a conversation with another, and that a simple reduction of the other to a sameness with oneself, or a pure objectification of the other, would preclude the possibility of a genuine interaction from which mutual understanding could arise (Gadamer, 1960). Levinas presents a monological account of understanding, ignoring the fundamentally dialogical nature of intersubjectivity. As Taylor (1994: 67) approvingly noted, understanding according to Gadamer is always a fusion of horizons, a coming-to-understanding between two individuals who require the perspective of the other in order to make sense of their own (and vice-versa). Neither the total incorporation of the other into the perspective of the recognisee, nor the reduction of the other to pure object, is possible on a hermeneutic account of meaning and understanding.

e. The Post-Structural Challenge

Concurrent with the rise of identity politics, there has been a trend towards ‘deconstructive’ or ‘destabilising’ accounts of the individual subject. Rather than representing a single critical perspective on recognition and identity politics, the post-structural challenge can be understood as a broad term incorporating various attempts at showing how the subject is always constructed through and within networks of power and discourse (e.g. Foucault, 1980; Butler, 1990; Haraway 1991; Lloyd, 2005; McNay, 2008).

Perhaps the most notable theorist in this regard is Foucault, who develops a detailed account of the way in which the subject is constituted through discursive relations of power. Within Foucault’s theory, the individual becomes the ‘site’ where power is enacted (and, importantly, resisted or reworked). Foucault’s genealogical method was employed precisely in order to explore the conditions under which we, as subjects, exist and what causes us to exist in the way that we do. According to Foucault, not only are we controlled by truth and power, we are created by it too. Concerning his genealogical method, Foucault (1980: 117) writes, ‘One has to dispense with the constituent subject, to get rid of the subject itself, that’s to say, to arrive at an analysis which can account for the constitution of the subject within a historical framework’. This leads to a far more problematic view of the subject than is generally found within recognition theories. Specifically, issues of power, coercion and oppression are seen as coeval with identity formation and intersubjective relations.

This suggests that there can be no instances of mutual recognition that do not simultaneously transmit and reproduce relations of power. As Foucault (1988: 39) notes, ‘If I tell the truth about myself… it is in part that I am constituted as a subject across a number of power relations which are exerted over me and which I exert over others’. Critics of recognition theorists argue that they ignore the fundamental relationship between power and identity formation, assuming instead that intersubjective relations can be established which are not mediated through power relations. McNay (2008) develops this critique through a discussion of Bourdieu’s concept of habitus, arguing that Taylor assumes that language is an expressive medium that functions independently of, and antecedent to, power and thus fails to analyse how ‘self-expression is constitutively shaped by power relations’ (ibid: 69).

Another important theorist in this regard is Judith Butler, whose account of gender identity develops certain key themes of Foucauldian theory as well as insights offered up by Derrida on the re-iteration of norms as fundamental to identity formation. Butler (1988: 519) begins outlining this project by arguing that gender is ‘in no way a stable identity or locus of agency from which various acts proceed; rather it is an identity tenuously constituted in time – an identity instituted through a stylized repetition of acts’. Gender is created through acts which are ‘internally discontinuous’. These acts produce the ‘appearance of substance’, but this apparition is no more than ‘a constructed identity, a performative accomplishment which the mundane social audience, including the actors themselves, come to believe and to perform in the mode of belief’ (ibid: 520; see also Butler 1990: 141). Essentially, we internalise a set of discursive practices which enforce conformity to a set of idealised and constructed accounts of gender identity that reinforce heterosexual, patriarchal assumptions about what a man and woman is meant to be like.

Turning the commonsense view of gender on its head, Butler argues that the various acts, thoughts and physical appearances which we take to arise from our gender are actually the very things which produce our sense of gender. Gender is the consequence, rather than the cause, of these individual, isolated, norm-governed acts. Because acts which constitute gender are governed by institutional norms which enforce certain modes of behaviour, thought, speech, and even shape our bodies, all positive constructions of gender categories will be exclusionary. Consequently, not only does Butler deny any ontological justification for a feminist identity politics, but she also rejects the possibility of a political justification. Identity categories ‘are never merely descriptive, but always normative, and as such, exclusionary’ (1992: 16). As a result, ‘Any effort to give universal content or specific content to the category of women… will necessarily produce factionalization’ and so, ‘“identity” as a point of departure can never hold as the solidifying ground of a feminist political movement’ (ibid: 15).

Infusing issues of power into the recognition debate therefore presents problems for existent models of recognition. Taken to its extreme, contemporary feminist accounts of gender and identity may be seen as reason to decisively reject recognition politics. If, as Butler suggests, gender identity is intrinsically connected to power, then to demand recognition for one’s identity could seen as becoming compliant with existing power structures. Such a position would have no possibility of radically critiquing the status quo and would thus potentially forfeit any emancipatory promise. Upon the relationship between the individual and power, Foucault (1980: 98) writes: ‘[Individuals] are not only its [power’s] intent or consenting target; they are always also the elements of its articulation. In other words, individuals are the vehicles of power, not its point of application’. The concern is that there is no form of self-realisation in recognition models that does not, in some way, reproduce patterns of dominance or exclusion.

6. The Future of Recognition

Despite the above reservations regarding the concept of recognition and its political application, there is a growing interest in the value of recognition as a normative socio-political principle. The increasingly multicultural nature of societies throughout the world seems to call for a political theory which places respect for difference at its core. In this regard, recognition theories seem likely to only increase in influence. It should also be noted that they are very much in their infancy. It was only in the 1990s that theorists formulated a comprehensive account of recognition as a foundational concept within theories of justice. To this extent, they are still in the process of being fashioned and re-evaluated in the light of critical assessment from various schools of thought.

For many thinkers, the concept of recognition captures a fundamental feature of human subjectivity. It draws attention to the vital importance of our social interactions in formulating our sense of identity and self-worth as well as revealing the underlying motivations for, and justifications of, political action. It seems particularly useful in making sense of notions of authenticity and the conditions for agency, as well as mapping out the conditions for rational responsibility and authority (see Brandom, 2009). As a result, recognition can be seen as an indispensible means for analysing social movements, assessing claims for justice, thinking through issues of equality and difference, understanding our concrete relations to others, and explicating the nature of personal identity. Although there remain concerns regarding various aspects of recognition as a social and political concept, it is entirely possible that many of these will be addressed and resolved through future research.

7. References and Further Reading

Alexander, Jeffrey C. and Lara, Maria P., ‘Honneth’s New Critical Theory of Recognition’. New Left Review. 1/220 (1996): 126-136
Appiah, Kwame, A. ‘Identity, Authenticity, Survival: Multicultural Societies and Social Reproduction’. Multiculturalism: Examining the Politics of Recognition. Ed. Amy Gutmann. Princeton: Princeton University Press. 1994: 149-163
Arendt, Hannah. The Human Condition. Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1958
Brandom, Robert. Reason in Philosophy: Animating Ideas. Cambridge, Ma.: Harvard University Press, 2009
Brandom, Robert. ‘The Structure of Desire and Recognition: Self-consciousness and Self-Constitution’. Philosophy & Social Criticism. 33:1 (2007): 127-150
Butler, Judith. ‘Performative Acts and Gender Constitution: An Essay in Phenomenology and Feminist Theory’. Theatre Journal, 40:4 (1988): 519-531
Butler, Judith.Gender Trouble: Feminism and the Subversion of Identity. New York: Routledge, 1990
Butler, Judith. ‘Contingent Foundations: Feminism and the Question of “Postmodernism”’. Feminists Theorize the Political. Ed. Butler, Judith and Joan W. Scott. London: Routledge, 1992. 3-21
De Beauvoir, Simone. The Second Sex. Harmondsworth: Penguin, 1972 [1949]
Fanon, Frantz. Black Skin, White Masks. London: Pluto, 1986 [1952]
Fichte, Johann G. Foundations in Natural Right: According to the Principles of the Wissenschaftslehre. Cambridge: CUP, 2000 [1796/7]
Foucault, Michel. Power/Knowledge: Selected Interviews and Other Writings. Brighton: Harvester, 1980
Foucault, Michel. Politics, Philosophy, Culture: Interviews and Other Writings 1977-1984. Ed. Kritzman, L. D. London: Routledge, 1988
Fraser, Nancy. Justice Interruptus: Critical Reflections on the “Postsocialist” Condition. New York: Routledge, 1997
Fraser, Nancy. ‘Rethinking Recognition’. New Left Review. 3 (2000): 107-120
Fraser, Nancy. ‘Recognition Without Ethics?’. Theory Culture & Society. 18:2-3 (2001): 21-42
Fraser, Nancy and Axel Honneth. Redistribution or Recognition: A Political-Philosophical Exchange. London: Verso, 2003
Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Truth and Method. London: Sheed and Ward, 1975 [1960]
Haraway, Donna. Simians, Cyborgs, and Women: The Reinvention of Nature. London: Free Association Books, 1991
Hegel, Georg W. G. Phenomenology of the Spirit. Trans. A. V. Miller. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1977 [1807]
Hegel, Georg W. G. Elements of the Philosophy of Right. Trans. H. B. Nisbet. Cambridge: CUP, 1991 [1821]
Habermas, Jürgen. ‘A Reply’. Communicative Action. Ed. Honneth, Axel and Hans Joas. Cambridge: Polity, 1991
Heyes, Cressida. ‘Can There Be a Queer Politics of Recognition?’. Recognition, Responsibility, and Rights: Feminist Ethics and Social Theory. Ed. Fiore, Robin N. and Hilde L. Nelson. Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 2003: 53-66
Honneth, Axel. ‘Integrity and Disrespect: Principles of a Conception of Morality Based on the Theory of Recognition’. Political Theory, 20:2 (1992): 187-201
Honneth, Axel. The Struggle for Recognition: The Grammar of Social Conflicts. Cambridge: Polity, 1995
Honneth, Axel. ‘Recognition or Redistribution? Changing Perspectives on a Moral Order of Society’. Theory, Culture & Society. 18:2-3 (2001): 43-44
Honneth, Axel. Disrespect: The Normative Foundations of Critical Theory. Cambridge: Polity, 2007
Ikäheimo, Heikki. ‘On the Genus and Species of Recognition.’ Inquiry, 45 (2002): 447-62
Ikäheimo, Heikki and Arto Laitinen. ‘Analyzing Recognition: Identification, Acknowledgement, and Recognitive Attitudes Towards Persons.’ Recognition and Power: Axel Honneth and the Tradition of Social Theory. Ed. Bert van den Brink and David Owen. New York: CUP, 2007: 33-56
Inwood, Michael. A Hegel Dictionary. Oxford: Blackwell, 1992
Jones, Peter. ‘Equality, Recognition and Difference’. Critical Review of International Social and Political Philosophy. 9:1 (2006): 23-46
Jones, Peter (ed.). Group Rights. Aldershot: Ashgate, 2009
Kymlicka, Will. Multicultural Citizenship: A Liberal Theory of Minority Rights. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995
Laden, Anthony S. ‘Reasonable Deliberation, Constructive Power, and the Struggle for Recognition’. Recognition and Power: Axel Honneth and the Tradition of Social Theory. Ed. Bert van den Brink and David Owen. New York: CUP, 2007: 270-289
Laitinen, Arto. ‘Interpersonal Recognition: A Response to Value or a Precondition of Personhood?’ Inquiry, 45 (2002): 463-78
Levinas, Emmanuel. Totality and Infinity: An Essay on Exteriority. Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1969 [1961]
List, Christian and Philip Pettit, Group Agency. Oxford: OUP, 2011
Lloyd, Moya. Beyond Identity Politics: Feminism, Power & Politics. London: Sage, 2005
Margalit, Avishai. ‘Recognizing the Brother and the Other.’ Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society: Supplementary Volumes, vol. 75 (2001): 127-139
Markell, Patchen. ‘The Recognition of Politics: A Comment on Emcke and Tully’. Constellations, 7:4 (2002): 496-506
Markell, Patchen. Bound By Recognition. New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 2003
Markell, Patchen. ‘The Potential and the Actual: Mead, Honneth, and the “I”’. Recognition and Power: Axel Honneth and the Tradition of Social Theory. Ed. Bert van den Brink and David Owen. New York: CUP, 2007: 100-134
McBride, Cillian. ‘Demanding Recognition: Equality, Respect, and Esteem’. European Journal of Political Theory 8:1 (2009): 96-108
McNay, Lois. Against Recognition. Cambridge: Polity, 2008
Mead, George H. Mind, Self and Society: From the Standpoint of a Social Behaviourist. Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1934
Nicholson, Linda. ‘To Be or Not To Be: Charles Taylor and the Politics of Recognition’. Constellations, 3:1 (1996): 1-16
Merleau-Ponty, Maurice. Phenomenology of Perception. Trans. C. Smith. Oxford: Routledge, 2002 [1945]
Pinkard, Terry. Hegel’s Phenomenology: The Sociality of Reason. Cambridge: CUP, 1996
Rogers, Melvin L. ‘Rereading Honneth: Exodus Politics and the Paradox of Recognition’. European Journal of Political Theory, 8:2 (2007): 183-206
Rousseau, Jean-Jacques. ‘A Discourse on the Origin of Inequality’. Discourses and Other Early Political Writings. Trans. Victor Gourevitch. Cambridge: CUP, 1997 [1754]
Sartre, Jean-Paul. Being and Nothingness: An Essay in Phenomenological Ontology. London: Methuen & Co., 1957 [1943]
Stern, Robert. Hegel and the Phenomenology of Spirit. London: Routledge, 2002
Taylor, Charles. ‘The Politics of Recognition’. Multiculturalism: Examining the Politics of Recognition. Ed. Amy Gutmann. Princeton: Princeton University Press. 1994: 25-73
Thompson, Simon. The Political Theory of Recognition: A Critical Introduction. Cambridge: Polity, 2006
Tully, James. Strange Multiplicity: Constitutionalism in the Age of Diversity. Cambridge: CUP, 1995
Tuomela, Raimo. The Philosophy of Sociality: The Shared Point of View. Oxford: OUP. 2007
Williams, Robert R. Recognition: Fichte and Hegel on the Other. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1992
Williams, Robert R. Hegel’s Ethics of Recognition. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1992
Yar, Majid. ‘Recognition and the Politics of Human(e) Desires’. Recognition and Difference: Politics, Identity, Multiculture. Ed. Featherstone, Mike and Scott Lash. London: Sage, 2002
Young, Iris M. Justice and the Politics of Difference. New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 1990
Zurn, Christopher F. ‘Anthropology and Normativity: A Critique of Axel Honneth’s “Formal Conception of Ethical Life”’. Philosophy and Social Criticism, 26:1 (2000): 115-214
Zurn, Christopher F. ‘Identity or Status? Struggles Over ‘Recognition’ in Fraser, Honneth and Taylor’. Constellations, 10:4 (2003): 519-537

Author Information

Paddy McQueen
Email: paddymcqueen@gmail.com
Queen’s University
Northern Ireland

Ninon de Lenclos (1620—1705)

A salonnière during the reign of Louis XIV, Ninon de Lenclos embodied libertinism in both theory and practice. As a notorious courtesan, Lenclos scandalized France by her numerous affairs with prominent statesmen and ecclesiastics. As a philosopher, she justified sexual license by her naturalistic theories of human nature and of morality. In Lenclos’s perspective, the human person is demonstrably a part of material nature. Allegedly spiritual human experiences, love in particular, are only a sophisticated variation on animal instincts. Rather than being a pursuit of spiritualized virtue, human moral conduct is the effort to expand pleasure and to eliminate pain. Within the hierarchy of pleasures, romantic love constitutes the pinnacle. Lenclos condemns the ascetical ethics of monastic Christianity and of Platonism because it has exalted a spiritualized love which is illusory and impossible to practice. In her mechanistic theory of the world, material causation is responsible for many of the intellectual and volitional activities other philosophers wrongly attribute to an immaterial soul. Through her naturalistic metaphysics and her ethics of the primacy of pleasure, Lenclos contributed to the Epicurean revival of the French Renaissance. In her insistence on the equal rights of women and men to the pursuit of pleasure, Lenclos developed a gendered version of Epicureanism which challenged her society’s subordination of women to men.

Biography
Works
Epicurean Philosophy
Reception and Interpretation
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Anne de Lenclos was born in Paris on November 10, 1620, and she died on October 17, 1705. She was nicknamed “Ninon” by her father. Her family was philosophically divided. A devout Catholic, her mother attempted to raise the precocious daughter according to the strict moral standards of Counter-Reformational Catholicism. A neo-Epicurean, her father introduced her to a more skeptical world outlook and to a libertine code of ethics. From an early age, Ninon clearly sided with her father’s perspective.

A child prodigy, Ninon de Lenclos enchanted Parisian salons with her mastery of the lute and clavichord. She mastered multiple foreign languages, including Spanish and Italian. A voracious reader, she maintained a life-long affection for her favorite philosopher, Montaigne.

During her teen years, Lenclos began her career as one of Paris’s most celebrated courtesans. During her many public affairs, she became the mistress of numerous prominent men. Statesmen included the Grand Condé, Gaston de Cligny; Louis de Mornay, marquis de Villarceaux; and François, duc de la Rochefoucauld. Clergy included the Abbé de Chateauneuf and Canon Gédoyn. Cardinal Richelieu counted among one of her spurned petitioners.

If Lenclos’s bold libertinism titillated the more skeptical salons, it scandalized the capital’s devout circles. Queen Anne of Austria, regent of France, placed Lenclos under house arrest at the Convent of the Madelonnettes in 1656. Thanks to the intervention of the exiled Christine, Queen of Sweden, who visited Lenclos in her convent cell, Lenclos was quickly freed from the convent and returned to her life as a courtesan.

Starting in 1667, Lenclos conducted a salon at the Hôtel de Sagonne in Paris. Major philosophical writers participating in the salon included the Cartesian Fontenelle and a group of neo-Epicurean authors: Charles de Saint-Évremond; Antoine Gombaud, chevalier de Méré; and Damien Mitton. The religious skepticism of this circle permeated the libertine atmosphere of Lenclos’s salon. Prominent literary figures included the aphorist François de la Rochefoucauld; the fabulist Jean de La Fontaine; the memorialist Louis de Rouvroy, duc de Saint-Simon; the chronicler Roger de Rabutin, comte de Bussy; the poet Jean Chapelle; the dramatist Jean Racine; and the literary critic Nicolas Boileau. Lenclos was especially close to Molière, whose anticlerical Tartuffe received an earlier reading in her salon. Other artists included the painter Nicolas Mignard and the musical composer Jean-Baptiste Lully. One of the central members of the salon was Henri de Sévigné, the husband of the famous epistoler; the correspondence between the Marquis de Sévigné and Lenclos would survive as Lenclos’s major piece of philosophical reflection. Numerous women also participated in the salon. Notable female authors included Marguerite de la Sablière; Henriette de Coligny, comtesse de la Suze; and Françoise d’Aubigné, the future Madame de Maintenon and morganatic wife of Louis XIV.

Over the decades, Lenclos’s salon became a protected meeting place for those who treated Christianity with skepticism and who championed a neo-Epicurean ethics of pleasure, with romantic love canonized as the supreme good. Lenclos impressed her guests with her wit and her defense of a life devoted to the pursuit of refined pleasure without conventional religious restraints. To the outrage of the devout, she presented lectures on love, with detailed counsels on romantic conquest and disentanglement. Female students were admitted for free; male students paid tuition. A generous patron of authors in need, she provided the young Voltaire with a substantial gift for the purchase of books in her will and testament.

2. Works

The major extant philosophical work of Lenclos is found in her correspondence. In 1750, Crébillon fils published a posthumous collection of Lenclos’s correspondence with the Marquis de Sévigné [LMDS]. In the letters, Lenclos details her philosophy of love and the naturalistic metaphysics and ethics underpinning it. Lenclos conducted a later correspondence (1697-1702) with Saint-Évremond, a neo-Epicurean friend and disciple of Gassendi. First published in 1752, these letters express her views on aging and death.

A 1659 pamphlet, The Coquette Avenged, has long been attributed to her. This brief work defends the possibility of a virtuous life independent of all formal religious influence. Contemporary literary scholars doubt that Lenclos is the actual author of this work, but it does express the secularist moral philosophy which characterized Lenclos and her inner salon circle.

3. Epicurean Philosophy

Throughout her career, Lenclos declared herself a disciple of Epicurus. In a letter to her, Saint-Évremond defines the neo-Epicurean creed of their milieu:

It would be useless to press the arguments, repeated a hundred times by the Epicureans, that the love of pleasure and the abolition of pain are the primary and most natural inclinations noticed in all people. Wealth, power, honor, and virtue contribute to our happiness, but the enjoyment of pleasure, let us call it voluptuousness, to sum up everything in a word, is the true aim and purpose to which all human acts are inclined. (Letter to the modern Leontium)

For Lenclos, the activity of love is the clearest human manifestation of the fundamental inclination to maximize pleasure and to minimize pain. Rather than the virtues, it is the passions which dominate the human will in its moral choices. Natural inclination determines psychological interaction as surely as it does the physical interaction of bodies. In exploring the romantic pursuit of pleasure, Lenclos argues for the fundamental equality and reciprocity between the genders.

a. Theory of Love

The sentiment of love is predominantly an instinct. It is a passion which owes little to reason. “The precise truth is that love is just a blind instinct which one must personally experience in order to appreciate it. It is an appetite which one has for one object in preference to another. One is not able to provide reasons for why one has this particular taste (LMDS no. 2).” The instinctual and emotive nature of love precludes rational justification for its emergence and development.

Lenclos stresses the sensate nature of love. The stereotyped practices of the lover indicate the sensual nature of the passion and its associated states. “Now tell me honestly: If your love were not the work of the senses, would you experience such pleasure in pondering that form, those eyes you find so beguiling, that mouth which you describe to me in such glowing colors (LMDS no. 11)?” While friendship may be contracted with many different types of people, love maintains a close connection with physical attraction. The obsessions common to the state of love indicate its sensate framework.

The attempt to tie the phenomenon of love to human reason leads to illusion. Especially damaging is the effort to refine love according to the canons of chivalry.

If you attempt to walk in the footsteps of our ancient heroes of the romances and attempt to develop great and restrained sentiments, you will soon discover that this alleged heroism only turns love into a sad and occasionally lethal folly. Love in fact is fanaticism. If you separate it from the romantic baggage public opinion has added to it, it will soon give you its proper sort of pleasure and happiness. Trust me: If it were reason that designed the affairs of the heart, love would be insipid (LMDS no. 4).

Divorced from its distinctive emotive violence, love would disappear and deteriorate into simple affection based on convenience or calculation.

Love also eludes moral subordination. It is basically an amoral passion. The characterization of the moral character of an amorous experience is the responsibility of the moral agent who has undergone it. “Love is a passion which is neither good nor bad in and of itself. Only those who have been affected by it can decide whether it is good or evil (LMDS no. 8).”

Especially illusory is the effort to conflate love with moral virtue. Despite efforts to subordinate love to virtue, love will govern even the most virtuous person as the natural instinct which it is.

Oh, you mortals, who rely so much on the power of your virtue! No matter how great your strength may be, there are moments when the most virtuous person becomes the weakest. The reason for this strange fact is that nature is always pursuing us. It is always aiming to achieve its ends. The desire for love in a woman is a substantial part of her natural constitution; her virtue has only been patched on (LMDS no. 10).

The effort to present love as a virtue masks the fundamental fact that love is a natural instinct, accountable to neither intellect nor will. Ascetical efforts to eliminate the arational dimensions of love will fail, given this natural inclination’s violent claim over the human person.

Since love can be explained by natural causation, it should be the object of neither praise nor blame. It is no more moral or immoral than the human instinct toward hydration and nutrition. “If I were you, I would not speculate on whether it is a good or bad thing to fall in love. I would rather have you speculate on whether it is good or bad to be thirsty, or whether it should be forbidden to give someone a drink just because some people might end up inebriated (LMDS no.9).” The natural causation of human love justifies Lenclos’s sexual libertinism. Like other natural impulses, sexual desire should be discussed in an objective, non-moral way. The possible distortions of this impulse should not lead to a moral censure of it or an attempt to repress it.

Lenclos’s naturalistic theory of the origin of love often uses mechanistic rhetoric. Echoing Descartes, Lenclos perceives amorous desire as the reflex reactions of the body-machine to external stimuli. “We have our need to have our emotions stimulated. Connected to our emotions is our basic physical machinery. This machinery is the ultimate and necessary cause of love (LMDS no. 8).” This mechanistic account of the origin and nature of human love reinforces Lenclos’s critique of efforts to rationalize or moralize what is simply a powerful natural instinct. Attempts to locate love’s origins in the allegedly spiritual faculties of intellect and will not only obscure its actual material roots; they ground ethical codes of love which mandate an unrealistic regulation of a powerful and necessary impulse.

b. Ethics of Pleasure

According to Lenclos, love is only the highest of goods in the hierarchy of pleasures which human beings pursue. “All that I can say in favor of love is that it gives us a greater pleasure than any of the other comforts of life. It pulls us out of our routines and stirs us up. It is love which satisfies one of our most urgent needs (LMDS no.8).” An authentic moral compass gauges the greater pleasures and the greater pains in light of the natural human inclinations which demand satisfaction. Herein lies the authentic path of human happiness.

Although love represents the highest pleasure known to the mature adult, it is a complex pleasure, often bearing concomitant pain.

When I spoke about temper I only meant the type which gives a stronger attraction, anxiety, and a little jealousy: that, in a word, which springs from love alone and not from any natural vulgarity, the vulgarity we often call ‘bad temper.’ When it is love that makes a woman difficult, when that alone is the cause of her prickliness, how can a lover be so insensitive as to complain about it? Don’t those rough spots only demonstrate the violence of this passion? Personally, I have always believed that those lovers who try to keep themselves within reasonable bounds are not completely in love. Can we really be in love without permitting ourselves to be pushed on by the fire of a consuming impetuosity, without experiencing all the commotion it necessarily causes? No, without any doubt (LMDS no.5)!

The mental and physical anguish provoked by the experience of authentic love is only a necessary dolor intrinsic to the greater pleasure of love itself. In fact, this violent moodiness constitutes one of the darker pleasures for the connoisseurs of sophisticated passion.

Love’s mixed pleasure is especially challenging for women. The contemporary Frenchwoman suffers from two social desires springing from romantic love: the desire to make her romantic conquest known by others and the desire to avoid censure by society.

A woman is always trying to balance two irreconcilable passions which continually agitate her soul: the desire to please and the fear of dishonor. You can easily recognize our embarrassment. On the one hand, we are consumed with the desire to have an audience to notice the effect of our charms….We would like the entire world to witness the favors we encounter and the homage paid to us….We enjoy the despair of our rivals and the indiscretions which betray the sentiments we inspire in others. We are delighted in proportion to the extent of the misery they suffer….But such sweet pleasures bring great bitterness….A sober and reasonable woman always prefers her reputation to romantic celebrity (LMDS no. 23).

The social context of love in the era of the salon complicates its mixed pleasures. The desire to be acclaimed as a triumphant courtesan, enjoying the rarified pleasure of revenge on one’s rivals, conflicts with the desire to maintain one’s moral status in a civil society which swiftly punishes the least trace of sexual transgression. The pleasure of sexual conquest contests the more sober pleasure of social esteem.

In her defense of an ethics of pleasure, Lenclos criticizes the dominant ethics of virtue. Led by the Platonists, philosophers have long mistakenly transformed the natural inclination of love, dominated by the axis of pain and pleasure, into the moralized field of virtue and vice.

Isn’t love a passion? Don’t very upright people argue that the passions and the vices are the same thing? Is vice ever more seductive than when it wears the cloak of virtue? In order to corrupt virtuous souls, it is sufficient for the alleged vice of love to appear in potential form. The Platonists deified love in an idealized form. In every age, in order to justify the passions, it was necessary to apotheosize them. What am I saying here? Am I so forward as to play the iconoclast with a prestigious superstition? Such temerity! Don’t I deserve to be attacked by all women for questioning their favorite cult (LMSD no.27)?

Both the condemnation of love as a vice and the exaltation of Platonic love to a virtue mask the material origins and nature of the amatory impulse. The contemporary morals of love occult the amoral nature of this mechanical inclination and delude moral agents into the censure of all carnal romance or into the pursuit of an impossibly rarified love emptied of all passion.

In her critique of the ethics of virtue, Lenclos attacks the moral asceticism that has long distorted the practice of love in France. Both Christianity and philosophy bear responsibility for the refusal to accord pleasure its natural rights in the human experience of love.

How I pity our good ancestors! What they thought was a mortal weariness and a melancholic madness we consider a joyous folly and a delightful delirium. They were fools. They preferred the austerities of deserts and rocks to the pleasures of a garden bursting with flowers. The habit of reflection has visited such prejudices upon us (LMDS no.8).

Christian and philosophical asceticism has not only attempted to eradicate sexual pleasure by considering love as a vice; it has turned all the pleasures of civilization into a temptation to be shunned in favor of the hermit-like illusions of the desert.

c. Metaphysical Naturalism

Lenclos’s treatment of love as a natural impulse is part of a broader naturalist metaphysics. The workings of nature, often conceived in mechanistic terms, cause many of the human actions wrongly interpreted as the offspring of a spiritual intellect or will.

The itinerary of romantic love indicates the all-embracing power of this natural causation. A romantic affair which begins in the illusion that it is the artifice of refined virtue quickly reveals its debt to the imperious powers of nature.

At the beginning of their affair, lovers fancy themselves inspired by the noblest and most refined sentiments. They exhaust their ingenuity, exaggerations, and the gushing of the most exquisite metaphysics. For a period they are intoxicated with the belief that their love is of a superior nature. But let us follow them as their affair unfolds. Nature quickly recovers its rights and re-assumes its influence. Soon enough, vanity, tired by the effusions of such an exalted purpose, leaves the heart free to express its feelings without any restraint. The day arrives when these lovers become dissatisfied with the pleasures of love. After having traveled a long circuit, they are surprised to find themselves at the very point where a peasant, following the inclinations of nature, would have begun (LMDS no. 9).

Even the most exalted romantic itinerary ultimately reveals its debt to the same forces of nature which control the amorous urges of the most illiterate peasant. Nature, rather than soul, controls human action.

Love is not the only area where nature manifests its blind hold over human desire and action. Nature determines the entire spectrum of objects to which the human person is attracted in its moral deliberations. “In forming us, nature gave us a certain range of sentiments, which must expend themselves upon some particular object (LMDS no. 2).” The predictable objects of desire for the various human instincts indicate how determinative nature has been in the constitution of the human person.

This naturalistic metaphysics is often presented in mechanistic terms. The phenomenon of love is only the most prominent of the activities by which the human body reveals its fundamental nature as a machine whose internal instincts are manipulated by appropriate external stimuli. “We women enter the world with this necessity of loving undefined. If we take one man in preference to another, let us honestly admit that we yield less to some knowledge of merit than to some mechanical instinct, which is nearly always blind (LMDS no.14).” The mechanistic nature of human deliberation and interaction is only masked by philosophical efforts to attribute such functions to a chimerical soul.

d. Gender Critique

In her analysis of love, Lenclos criticizes the roles assigned each gender in contemporary France. She insists that the psychological qualities of men do not differ from those of women. Furthermore, she insists that for love to yield its maximum pleasure, men must learn to treat women with a respect they have heretofore denied them.

In the dominant social prejudices of her era, men and women were perceived as fundamentally different in psyche as in body. In romantic intercourse, women were to be pleasant and amusing; men were to be intellectual and commanding. Lenclos argues, however, that the arts of politeness are as necessary for men as they are for women.

It is not because you [Marquis de Sévigné and other men] possess superior qualities that you are an agreeable companion….To be embraced with outstretched arms, you must be sympathetic, amusing, important to the pleasure of others. I warn you that you cannot succeed in any other manner, especially with women. Now tell me, what would you like me to do with your learning, with the geometry of your mind, and with the exactitude of your memory? Dear Marquis, if you only have such advantages, if you have no personal charm to balance your austerity, you will not please women. I can vouch for that. Far from pleasing them, you will seem to them like an intimidating critic. You will so constrain them that any pleasure they might have enjoyed in your presence will be banished (LMDS no. 7).

For romantic love to flourish, reciprocity must reign between the two partners. Men as well as women must cultivate the gentle arts of charm, flirtation, and fascination. The sexual stereotype of the emotional woman and the rational man must be abolished in favor of a more egalitarian vision of both genders called to develop both their intellectual and affective personalities.

In her critique of masculine misperceptions of women, Lenclos argues that men must learn to treat women as they themselves would like to be treated. She criticizes the Marquis de Sévigné for his misinterpretation of the reactions of a countess he is seeking to conquer romantically. Men must learn to empathize with the complex emotions women experience in the adventure of romantic love; like men, women must balance physical desire with public reputation.

A man without prejudice would see in the countess only a lover as reasonable as she is tender. Without stressing virtue, she remains attached to her reputation. In short, she is a woman who seeks to reconcile love and duty. The difficulty in allying these two contrary qualities is not slight. It is the source of the complexities which wound you. You yourself should imagine the battles she must sustain, the upheavals she endures, and the embarrassment she must be suffering on account of a lover who is too easily put off by signs of resistance (LMDS no. 43).

The masculine attempt to overwhelm women by a display of force and by a refusal to negotiate patiently destroys the possibility of authentic romance. In respecting the psychological complexity of women, a complexity more similar to that of men than men would usually imagine, men can both maximize their chance of romantic success and place the desired woman in a position of equality.

4. Reception and Interpretation

Lenclos’s long life as a bold courtesan, cheerfully mating prominent aristocrats and clerics of Parisian high society, has long overshadowed her contribution to philosophy. Most biographies detail the remarkable beauty of this courtesan into her eightieth year, her colorful affairs, and the scandals of her libertine salon. A series of artists have fictionalized her as the courtesan par excellence. In the nineteenth century, Henrion Ragueneau de la Chainaye wrote the drama Ninon de l’Enclos: comédie historique en un acte and Eugène de Mirecourt published the novel Mémoires de Ninon de Lenclos. In the twentieth century, director Abel Gance featured her in his film Cyrano et D’Artagnan and the cartoonist Patrick Cothias turned her into a comic spy in his graphic novels, especially Ninon secrète. An exception to this emphasis on scandal is the philosopher Victor Cousin (1792-1867), who treated Ninon de Lenclos as a philosopher who continued the hedonistic brand of philosophy she had learned from Saint-Évremond.

The recent revival of feminism has altered the racy popular portrait of Lenclos the naughty courtesan. Recent biographies have focused more extensively on the political sophistication, philosophical culture, and Epicurean theories of Lenclos. Duchêne (1984) underscores the complex philosophy of love by which Lenclos justified her numerous romantic liaisons. Debriffe (2002) presents Lenclos as a proto-feminist rebel against the submissive roles assigned to women in the genteel French society of the period.

Recent scholarship has focused on the actual writings and philosophical theories of Lenclos. Arenberg (2005), for example, studies the neo-Epicurean theories of aging and death present in Lenclos’s correspondence with Saint-Évremond. Lenclos’s theory of gender reciprocity and the role of her salon in the diffusion of Cartesianism and Epicureanism invite further investigation.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Lenclos, Ninon de. The Coquette Avenged. 1659.
Lenclos, Ninon de. Lettres de Ninon de Lenclos au marquis de Sévingé, avec sa Vie, 2 vols. Paris: Lendentu, 1820.
- An electronic version of this edition of Lenclos’s letters detailing her Epicurean philosophy of love can be found on the Gallica: Bibliothèque numérique subsection of the website of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.
Robinson, Charles Henry. Life, Letters, and Epicurean Philosophy of Ninon de l’Enclos. Chicago: Lion Publishing Co., 1903.
- Despite the antiquated biography, this edition of Lenclos’s writings provides a reliable translation of her correspondence with the Marquis de Sévigné and Saint-Évremond. An electronic version of this text is available on the website of Project Gutenberg.

b. Secondary Sources

Arenberg, Nancy. “Getting Old: Reflections on Aging in the Letters of Saint-Évremond and Ninon de Lenclos,” Papers on French Seventeenth-Century Literature, 2005, 32 (62), 243-56.
- The article analyzes the Epicurean treatment of aging, illness, and death in the correspondence between Lenclos and Saint-Évremond.
Debriffe, Martial. Ninon de Lenclos; La belle insoumise. Paris: France-Empire, 2002.
- This feminist interpretation of Lenclos interprets her libertinism as an act of social disobedience against the repressive mores of the period.
Duchêne, Roger. Ninon de Lenclos: La Courtisane du Grand Siècle. Paris: Fayard, 1984.
- While emphasizing Lenclos’s status as courtesan, this biography details the political complexity and the intellectual sophistication of Lenclos.
Niderst, Alain. “Lenjouée Plotine, Madame de Maintenon, Madeleine de Scudéry et Ninon de Lenclos,” Papers on French Seventeenth-Century Literature, 2000, 27 (53), 501-08.
- The article studies the political influence wielded by Lenclos and two contemporary salonnières.
Verdier, Gabrielle. “Libertine, Philanthropist, Revolutionary: Ninon’s Metamorphoses in the Age of Enlightenement,” in Libertinage and the Art of Writing, II, ed. David Rubin. New York: AMS, 1992, 101-147.
- The article interprets Ninon’s theoretical and sexual libertinage as a forerunner of the skepticism of the lumières.

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University Maryland
U. S. A.

Sarah Grimké (1792—1873) and Angelina Grimké Weld (1805—1879)

Sarah Grimké and Angelina Grimké Weld, sisters from a South Carolina slave-holding family, were active abolitionist public speakers and pioneer women’s rights advocates in a time when American women rarely occupied the public stage. Their personal stories about the horrors of slavery made them effective agents in the Northern abolitionist movement, and their subsequent marginalization in the leadership of that movement spurred them toward an articulation of women’s rights and duties in the public arena.

By necessity and conviction, both sisters connected appeals for abolition of slavery with defenses of a woman’s right to political action, understanding that they could not be effective against slavery while they did not have a public voice. They are most often referenced together in historical and philosophical texts because they lived and worked together most of their lives, jointly developing their arguments and reading each other’s works. Angelina is best known for her original work in opposition to slavery and her brilliant oratory style, while Sarah Grimké developed a radical theory of women’s rights that pre-dated and influenced the beginning of the women’s right movement in Seneca Falls. Both women connected the oppression of African Americans with the oppression of women.

Biography
Philosophical Writing
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

a. Cultural and Formative Influences

Sarah Grimké was the sixth child born to John and Mary Grimke, plantation owners and slave holders in Charleston, South Carolina. Her father was a well-known attorney who became the chief judge of the Supreme Court of South Carolina. Sarah loved learning and studied with her older brother, hoping to go on to college and practice law like her brother, but her father forbade her from continuing her studies. At age 13, she was allowed to become the godmother of her baby sister Angelina, and was very much a part of her sister’s upbringing. In her mid-twenties, Sarah traveled with her seriously ill father to Philadelphia to be treated by a doctor, where they took up residence at a Quaker boarding house. When the treatment failed, she alone took care of him at the New Jersey seashore for the months he was dying.

Sarah and Angelina Grimké lived in an era of religious revivalism and utopian experimentalism, both of which had an impact in various times on their lives. While returning to Charleston after her father’s death, Sarah experienced a religious conversion after reading Quaker literature and began having religious mystical experiences. In 1821, at the age of 29, disillusioned with life in Charleston, Sarah moved to Philadelphia and joined the Fourth and Arch Street Meeting of the Society of Friends. Women were welcomed into the ministry in Quaker congregations; she saw the example of Lucretia Mott in the ministry in her own meeting. Sarah felt called to a role in the ministry, but her testimony in the meetings was never supported by the Quaker elders. Her conviction of a religious calling may be the reason she turned down a marriage proposal, and is evident in her early tendency to defend women’s rights using Christian theology iconography (Lerner 1998b, 4).

When Angelina Grimké came to realize the horrors of slavery, she first spoke out against it in the Presbyterian Church in Charleston where she had been an active member and teacher. She became frustrated with the Presbyterian minister who spoke privately with her against slavery but would not publicly denounce it. In 1827, Angelina, like her sister, had a religious conversion experience when Quaker minister Anna Braithwaite came to Charleston and stayed with the Grimké family. Following that event, she began worshipping in the tiny Charleston Quaker meeting. Instead of leaving Charleston, Angelina stayed on with a perceived mission to convert her family, if not to Quakerism, at least to abandon slavery. Six months of articulate and forceful discussion, intense prayer sessions, family upheavals and visits from friends and clergy did not change Angelina’s mind, nor did her arguments produce any resulting change among her family or friends. She was called to testify to Presbyterian Church leaders about her beliefs which resulted in expulsion from the church. In 1829 Angelina left South Carolina to join Sarah in Philadelphia, and began worshipping with the Fourth and Arch Street Meeting.

As women, Sarah and Angelina were sheltered and limited in both thought and action in their South Carolina culture, but joining the Society of Friends also limited their interaction with their contemporary world. In Philadelphia the only newspaper they read was The Friend, a Quaker weekly that passed along Quaker views on issues such as women’s rights. They could have benefited from larger feminist dialogue, such as in a sympathetic reading of the work of the Englishwoman, Frances Wright, who publicly campaigned for women’s rights in the U.S. in 1828-29. It seems more probable that the sisters would have known of African American activist Maria W. Stewart, the first American woman to speak publicly against slavery in 1831-33, whose work was published by William Lloyd Garrison.

In Philadelphia, Angelina taught classes at the school that her widowed sister Anna Frost had started in order to supplement her small income. Unhappy with her teaching experience there, Angelina considered attending and possibly teaching at the prestigious Hartford Female Seminary, a school founded and run by Catherine Beecher (whose views on women’s roles Angelina would later publicly criticize). Although she was impressed and excited by the opportunities she saw at Hartford, the Quaker elders would not give her permission to move there. Instead she settled into Philadelphia Quaker life, teaching at the infant school.

b. Public Activism: 1834-1837

In 1934, after the sudden death of the man Angelina expected to marry and the death of their respected brother, Thomas, who had been Sarah’s childhood companion, the two sisters found themselves growing more uncertain of the Quaker restrictions, and began looking for new ways to be “useful.” Angelina devoured news of the abolitionists’ struggles, including the persecution they suffered in nearly every northern city where they spoke. After reading about the struggles of the abolitionists, she wrote a moving letter to Garrison, which was published without her permission in his abolitionist journal, The Liberator. This letter catapulted Angelina into the public realm, and was followed in (1836) by her Appeal to the Christian Women of the Southern States. The Appeal was written in a personal tone, addressing Southern women as friends and colleagues. When copies of it reached the Grimké sisters’ home town of Charleston, they were publicly burned by the postmaster, and Mrs. Grimké was warned that her daughters would be prevented from ever visiting Charleston again.

In 1836, Angelina and Sarah moved to New York (against the advice and without the permission of the Philadelphia Quakers) to begin work as agents for the abolitionist cause. They were the only women to attend the 19-day intensive training during the Agents’ Convention of the American Anti-Slavery Convention in November. Within weeks of the training, they began offering public talks for female anti-slavery meetings in New York. In their talks they advocated practical ways that Northerners could influence slavery regulations, but also urged their audiences to locate and root out race prejudice in their own lives and communities. According to their analysis, race prejudice in the North and the South was a major support of the slave system. They understood this from their own experience with slaves and free blacks in the North, as well as through discussions with one of their mentors, the leading abolitionist Theodore Dwight Weld.

Following the Agents’ Convention, both Grimké sisters began their active political campaign for the abolitionist cause. They helped organize the New York Anti-Slavery Convention of American Women which strengthened their bonds with other women activists in the anti-slavery cause and in 1837 began touring Northern cities, giving talks to packed audiences. Their work was very successful and led to the creation of more female anti-slavery associations and thousands of signatures on anti-slavery petitions. However, in every city they visited, the fact that they were women speaking before a mixed (male and female) audience created an uproar, even among abolitionist sympathizers. Many religious leaders hotly rejected the idea that women should speak from pulpits and public stages. In mid-1837, as Angelina and Sarah were on their speaking tour, the Congregational Churches issued a “Pastoral Letter” warning their congregations of “the dangers which at present seem to threaten the female character with widespread and permanent injury” and called women to remember their “appropriate duties and influence … as clearly stated in the New Testament” (Lerner 1998a, 143).

Religious leaders were not the only ones who reacted against the sisters’ work. Catherine Beecher, whom Angelina had once hoped to study with, published a critique of their approach to abolition, specifically addressed to Angelina Grimké. In her essay Beecher advocated gradualism instead of immediate emancipation, and also called women to remember their subordinate role in society. Angelina responded in the summer of 1837, publishing Letters to Catherine Beecher, defending immediate emancipation of slaves, as well as the right and responsibility of women to participate as citizens in their society. During this same period, Sarah also began writing Letters on the Equality of the Sexes.

Their speaking tour ended in late 1837 with Angelina very ill and both sisters exhausted from their grueling traveling and lecturing schedule.

c. Continuing Influence and Later Projects

The debate over women’s participation began to split the anti-slavery movement. Even the New York Executive Committee, who trained the sisters for public speaking, was unwilling to give them official “agent” status, fearing that public energy would be diverted by the women’s right issue. In letters to the Grimké sisters, abolitionist leaders Theodore Weld and Quaker John Whittier asked them to concentrate only on the anti-slavery issue. Referencing their work on women’s rights, Whittier asked, “Is it not forgetting the great and dreadful wrongs of the slave in a selfish crusade against some paltry grievances of our own?” Angelina and Sarah responded that women needed to claim free speech and other rights in order to do the work they were called to do. “What then can woman do for the slave when she is herself under the feet of man and shamed into silence?” (Lerner 1998a, 151-2)

Instead of withdrawing from the public stage, Angelina and Sarah went on to achieve even more notoriety when, in 1838, Angelina testified at a Committee of the Legislature of the State of Massachusetts, becoming the first American woman to testify in a legislative meeting. Later in 1838, at the age of 33, Angelina married abolitionist Theodore Dwight Weld, and they moved with Sarah to Fort Lee, New Jersey. Although it was both Angelina’s and Sarah’s intention to continue their public activism, the pressures of running a household and raising three children, as well as the results of increasing poverty required them to withdraw from the speaking in the public arena. They continued to write and work to support abolitionist causes. One of their first projects after the marriage was to comb through back issues of Southern newspapers to gather empirical data about slavery for Weld’s book, American Slavery As It Is (1839). That text also contains essays written by the Grimké sisters which provide clear and horrifying details of the conditions of slavery from their own experiences.

Although the Grimké sisters were no longer public lecturers, the fervor they raised about the “woman question” continued to cause dissention in the abolitionist movement. That issue, joined with other divisions about utopian/anarchist withdrawal versus political action, caused the movement to split into two separate organizations in 1840. Unfortunately the organization which embraced political action – in some ways the natural choice for Weld and for the Grimké sisters – also excluded the participation of women. Weld and both of the sisters withdrew from active participation for a short time; when Theodore resumed his activist work in 1841, Angelina and Sarah were overwhelmed with caring for the young children and maintaining the farm.

In 1848, Weld and the two sisters established a co-educational boarding school out of their home, with Angelina teaching history and Sarah teaching French. Although friends and family sent their children there (two sons of Elizabeth Cady Stanton attended) the school was a struggle, and made very little money. In 1854 the Welds and Sarah joined the utopian community Raritan Bay Union, where Theodore Weld started the progressive and experiential Eagleswood School. Angelina and Sarah both taught and assisted with administration. The school continued when the Union failed two years later, with Angelina and Sarah as teachers. In 1862 the family moved to Boston to continue their teaching careers.

Angelina and Sarah remained committed to women’s issues, but their ability to be physically involved in activism was limited. Their example as women who spoke publicly against slavery and for women’s rights continued to inspire other female activists. Recognizing Angelina’s impact on women’s rights, the women’s rights leaders elected her a member of the Central Committee of the 1850 woman’s rights convention even though she was unable to attend. Both women continued to participate in future women’s rights convention and in the women’s movement, however mostly through letters and other writings. As late as 1870 they were both vice presidents of the Massachusetts Woman Suffrage Association, and symbolically cast ballots in a local election.

In 1868, Angelina and Sarah discovered that their brother Henry had fathered children by his female slave, Nancy Weston. Those children, Archibald, John and Francis James Grimké had been sold into slavery by their half-brother. When Angelina and Sarah found out about these three young men, they established close relationships, and supported Archibald and Francis through college and graduate school. Archie studied law at Harvard, and Francis went to Princeton Theological Seminary. Both men went on to national leadership among the Black communities. As pastor of the 15^th Street Presbyterian Church in Washington D.C., Francis Grimké and his wife Charlotte Forten Grimké were friends and colleagues of Anna Julia Cooper. Archibald was a vice-president of the NAACP and president of the American Negro Academy.

Sarah Grimké died in 1873, Angelina Grimké Weld died in 1879. Catherine Birney, a former student at their boarding school, published a full biography of the sisters in 1885.

2. Philosophical Writing

a. Abolitionist Reasoning

Although their early education was limited, while growing up in a family of lawyers and judges the Grimké sisters became familiar with constitutional law based on the liberal political theory of the founders of the constitution. According to historian Gerda Lerner (1998b, 22) Sarah had read Locke, Jefferson, and other Enlightenment thinkers, and her writing consistently integrates these Enlightenment ideals with Biblical analysis. In Sarah’s first major writing, An Epistle to the Clergy of the Southern States (1836), she combines a scholarly interpretation of the Old Testament with language from Bill of Rights. It is written in the style of the apostolic letters in the New Testament, and as such seems odd to modern ears. In this essay, Sarah’s first claim is that slavery is in opposition to Biblical teaching. She uses Genesis to support her claim that although humans can use animals as “means” – as food to sustain their existence, all people are created in God’s image and so cannot be used as mere means for others’ ends. She moves to a more Kantian understanding that making such a God-created “man” into a “thing” violates “God’s unchanging degree.” Given a philosophic understanding that immortality is dependent on rationality, she points out that every slave is a “rational and immortal being” and so has certain “inalienable rights” (Ceplair 92), reflective of her reading of Locke’s Natural Rights argument. In her Epistle, Sarah called “every Christian minister” to “preach the word of immediate emancipation” (Ceplair 109).

In 1836, Angelina published her first work, the Appeal to the Christian Women of the South, written in the form of a letter to close friends. Her claim for the equality of slaves is also based on natural rights as well as God-given rights. In the Lockean language of the Declaration of Independence she points out that “all men, every where and of every color are born equal and have an inalienable right to liberty” (Ceplair 38). She continues by dismantling claims that slavery is sanctioned under Hebrew law, pointing out that none of the ways that Hebrew men or women became servants in Old Testament law are applicable to the conditions of African American slavery. Responding to slave-owners’ claims that Christ did not condemn slavery, she demonstrates how treating other humans as “chattel property” contradicts the commandment that “Whatsoever ye would that men should do to you, do ye even so to them” (Ceplair 50). While acknowledging that women do not have the right to vote, she evokes the image of Esther’s political action in the Bible, appealing directly to Southern women to gather signatures on petitions to their legislatures. “Such appeals to your legislatures would be irresistible, for there is something in the heart of man which will bend under moral suasion” (Ceplair 66).

After reading Angelina’s Appeal to the Christian Women of the South, influential educator Catherine Beecher (1800-1878) responded by publishing an 1837 article addressed to Angelina Grimké, titled An Essay on Slavery and Abolitionism with reference to the Duty of American Females, critiquing the idea of immediate emancipation. Beecher was one of a number of Americans who agreed that slavery was wrong but argued for “gradualism.” Gradualists argued that slavery could be eradicated slowly though such measures as stopping the slave trade, freeing the children of slaves, banning slavery in new territories, or even re-colonizing slaves back to Africa. Beecher supported the re-colonization movement which raised funds to send black ex-slaves back to Africa. Responding in the Letters to Catherine Beecher, Angelina defended immediate abolition, showed the fallacies of gradualism, attacked racial prejudice, and defended women’s right and responsibility to do public activism. She reiterated the abolitionist principle “that no circumstances can ever justify a man holding his fellow man as property,” concluding that the slave owner is “bound immediately to cease holding (the slave)” (Ceplair 149-150). She also pointed out that although Northerners had outlawed slavery, they were guilty of racial prejudice, which was at the heart of gradualism and the re-colonization movement. And so, she said, “I am trying to talk down, and write down and live down this horrible prejudice … we must dig up this weed by the roots out of each of our hearts…” (Lerner 1998a, 141). Later in 1837, responding to a public request to present “definite practicable means” by which Northerners could have affect on slavery, the Grimké sisters once again point to racial prejudice in the North as also responsible for making slavery possible. As she reiterated later, “Northern prejudice against color is grinding the colored man to the dust in our free states, and this is strengthening the hands of the oppressor continually” (“Letter to Clarkston” Ceplair 121). The Grimkés understood that slavery and race inequity “degrades the oppressor as well as the oppressed” (Weld, et al 1934, 790).

b. Women’s Rights

In order to claim the right to speak in public, Angelina and Sarah had to argue against the conventional philosophy that men and women were naturally meant to occupy “separate spheres” of existence – that woman’s role was in the private sphere, while men controlled the public sphere. As has often been the case in history, some of the most fervent opposition to women’s rights came from other women. Catherine Beecher was well-known as a pioneering advocate for women’s education, who established many schools for women including the Hartford Female Seminary. As such, she was a public person by virtue of the organizations that she created, and the leadership roles she played in society, yet she did not believe that women should have political roles. Although Beecher argued that child-raising and women’s work in the household required that women be educated, she did not support women’s suffrage or the idea of women petitioning Congress. As she said, “Men are the proper persons to make appeals to the rulers whom they appoint… [women] are surely out of place in attempting to do it themselves” (Lerner 1998a, 140).

In Letters XI and XII of her response to Beecher, Angelina logically dismantles the separate spheres mentality as prescribed by Rousseau and claimed instead that as moral beings the spheres of woman and man are the same. She explicitly connects abolitionist work to women’s rights, noting that her “investigation into the rights of the slave has led me to a better understanding of my own.” The natural corollary of her abolitionist argument that as slaves, “human beings have rights because they are moral beings” is that women too have human rights that are not dependent on their sex. Hence, “whatever is morally right for a man to do, it is morally right for a woman to do” (Ceplair 194-5). Angelina ends these two letters with the recommendation that the reader refer to Sarah Grimké’s writing on the subject of women’s rights.

Immersed as they were in Christian culture and traditions, the Grimké sisters faced Bible-based opposition to the idea of women’s equality. Given their religious training, they replied to their critics with careful Biblical reasoning in defense of women’s rights, against what they said was the common “perverted interpretation” of the Bible. In the first chapter of Sarah’s Letters on the Equality of the Sexes and the Condition of Women (Ceplair 104) she begins with the two creation stories in Genesis to claim women’s equality. First, she points out that women as well as men were created in God’s image, in “perfect equality.” In the second creation story, Eve is formed out a rib of Adam, to be a helpmeet, “in all respects his equal,” as she reasons that a companion created by God would necessarily be his equal. Her religious critics would then point to the story of the fall, and Eve’s role in that. Sarah points out that Eve succumbed to supernatural evil, while Adam succumbed to merely mortal temptation, and thus men could not claim moral superiority over women. She claims that the phrase “Thou wilt be subject unto thy husband, and he will rule over thee” is a mistranslation. The Hebrew, she claimed, “uses the same word to express shall and will.” Thus, the phrase should in fact be translated as a prophecy, not a command, in the same way that the “immediate struggle for dominion” among humans is a prophecy, not a command. She concludes that there is no reason to conclude from the Genesis story that original sin created a necessary condition of inequality between men and women. Then, as God has not caused a condition of inequality between men and women, she asks in the next letter that her brethren “take their feet from off our necks allowing us to stand upright” (Ceplair 208).

Angelina and Sarah continued throughout their work to claim their rights as citizens of the republic, whose “honor, happiness and well-being are bound up in its politics, government and law” (Lerner 1998a, 8). This claim was echoed 10 years later in 1848 in the Declaration of Sentiments presented at Seneca Falls Convention for women’s rights. Throughout Sarah’s and Angelina’s writing, their arguments for women’s rights is based on the moral authority of the reasoning person – similar to the arguments that they both made for natural rights for African Americans. In this they may also be reflecting some of the arguments that they had read in Mary Wollstonecraft’s 1792 Vindication of the Rights of Women.

c. Connecting Race Oppression to the Oppression of Women

The Grimké sisters were among the first to explicitly connect race oppression to women’s oppression. Sarah “thanked” John Quincy Adams in her Letters on Equality for placing women “side by side with the slave” “ranking us with the oppressed.” Using a Kantian ethical argument that opposes using humans as means rather than as ends in themselves, she noted that historically “woman has … been made a means to promote the welfare of man” (Ceplair 209). She tied the subordination of slaves and women to educational deprivation, noting that both women and slaves been deemed mentally inferior “while being denied the privileges of liberal education” (Lerner 1998a, 122-3). In 1863 after Lincoln’s Emancipation Proclamation, Angelina said that as women, “True, we have not felt the slaveholder’s lash; true we have not had our hands manacled, but our hearts have been crushed … I want to be identified with the negro; until he gets his rights, we shall never have ours” (Lerner 1998a, 263). Throughout their lives the sisters also stressed their bonds of sisterhood with African American women, in both their writing and in their close friendships with African American women.

Sarah’s claim that sexual oppression was a major cause of the subordination of women was far ahead of her contemporaries. Writing in the late 1850s Sarah used the language of bondage to speak of women’s roles. “She is your slave, the victim of your passions, the sharer willingly and unwillingly of your licentiousness” (Lerner 1998b, 81). She examined marital rape in her essay “Marriage” in an era when it would have been shocking for a woman to discuss such things. She identifies women as in a position of slavery for being unable to refuse sex to her husband. Instead of having loving sexual relations, women would often “rise in the morning oppressed with a sense of degradation from the fact that their chastity has been violated…” discovering that she is a “legal prostitute … a mere convenience” (Lerner 1998b, 113-114). She called for the right of education for women, full human rights, financial independence and a woman’s right to decide when and if she would become a mother. In other essays she identified men, individually and as a group, as having benefited from women’s oppression in the same way that plantation owners benefited from race oppression.

When John Stuart Mill’s The Subjection of Women came out in 1869, Sarah at age 77 walked throughout her neighborhood selling 150 copies of the book to her neighbors (Lerner 40). It’s no wonder that Mill’s book appealed to Sarah – it contains arguments for equal rights for women that are very similar to those developed by the Grimké sisters.

3. References and Further Reading

Bartlett, Elizabeth Ann (ed.) 1988. Sarah Grimké, Letters on the Equality of the Sexes and other Essays. New Haven: Yale University Press.
- In this collection of the writings of Sarah Grimké Bartlett argues that Sarah’s Letters is the first philosophical work on the condition of women in America.
Birney, Catherine. 1885. The Grimké Sisters: Sarah and Angelina Grimké: the First Women Advocates of Abolition and Women’s Rights. Boston: Lee and Sheppard.
- The earliest biography of the Grimké sisters written by the daughter of a family friend. The full text is available in e-format from several online publishers.
Ceplair, Larry, (ed). 1989. The Public Years of Sarah and Angelina Grimké: Selected Writings 1836-1839. New York: Columbia University Press.
- This valuable text contains the major works of the Grimké sisters (some of them excerpted) with short introductions by the editor.
Grimké, Angelina. 2003. Walking by Faith: The Diary of Angelina Grimke, 1828-1835. Ed. Charles Wilbanks. University of South Carolina Press.
Lerner, Gerda. 1998a. The Grimké Sisters from South Carolina: Pioneers for Women’s Rights and Abolition. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Reprint of Lerner’s 1967 biography with a new introduction; this is the most complete intellectual biography of the Grimké sisters.
Lerner, Gerda. 1998b. The Feminist Thought of Sarah Grimké. New York: Oxford University Press. This companion book to Lerner’s full biography contains a short biographical introduction to Sarah Grimké’s life, as well as reprints of Sarah’s letters and essays.
Lumpkin, Katharine Du Pre. 1974. The Emancipation of Angelina Grimké. Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina Press.
- Biography of Angelina Grimké that explores the forces behind Angelina’s break with the Southern Christian culture of her youth.
Weld, Theodore Dwight, ed. 1839. American Slavery As It Is: Testimony of a Thousand Witnesses. New York: American Anti-Slavery Society.
Weld, Theodore Dwight, ed. 1934. Angelina Grimké Weld, and Sarah Grimké. Letters of Theodore Dwight Weld, Angelina Grimké Weld and Sarah Grimké: 1822-1844. 2 vols. Gilbert H. Barnes and Dwight L. Dumond, eds. New York: D. Appleton-Century Company, Inc.

Author Information

Judy Whipps
Email: whippsj@gvsu.edu
Grand Valley State University
U. S. A.

Empathy and Sympathy in Ethics

The distinction between “empathy” and “sympathy” in the context of ethics is a dynamic and challenging one. The eighteenth century texts of David Hume and Adam Smith used the word “sympathy,” but not “empathy,” although the conceptual distinction marked by empathy was doing essential work in their writings. After discussing the early uses of these terms, this article is organized historically. Two traditions are distinguished. The first is the Anglo-American tradition, and it extends from Hume and Smith to the twenty-first century work of Michael Slote. Stephen Darwall’s contribution is applied in engaging Hume and Smith. Finally, the interrelation of empathy, sympathy and altruism is explored in the work of John Rawls and Thomas Nagel. The second tradition is the Continental one. It extends from the spirituality of Johann Herder to the phenomenological movement of Edmund Husserl, Martin Heidegger, Max Scheler, and Edith Stein. The intentional analysis of empathy is directly relevant to the constitution of the social community in a broad, normative relationship with the “Other.” Empathy (Einfühlung) is sui generis an intentional (mental) act that starts out in the superstructure of intersubjectivity in Husserl and steadily migrates towards the foundation of community under the influence of Heidegger, Scheler, and Stein. The choice of which philosophers and thinkers to include is also determined by the contingent facts that those chosen are most likely to be encountered in contemporary debates about empathy, sympathy, and ethics. Stein, Husserl, and Heidegger are primarily epistemological, ontological, and post-onto-theological, and are in the background of any contemporary, formal engagement with ethical theories, which is the focus of the present article. Scheler turns his phenomenological intuition of essence (wesenschau) towards the moral sentiments; and his analysis of the diversity of sympathetic forms is a lasting contribution to the topic. Contemporary Continental thinkers such as Larry Hatab and Frederick Olafson associate empathy with Heideggerian Mitsein and Mitdasein (being in the world with others) as the existential foundation of ethics). The roles of Friedrich Nietzsche, the Holocaust, and the “Other,” especially in Emmanuel Levinas, are distinguishing marks of the ethical approach on the Continent. The article ends with a discussion of how the discipline of psychoanalysis contributes to the role of empathy.

Introduction
An Example and a Working Definition
The Anglo-American Tradition
The Continental Tradition
Empathy in the Context of Psychoanalysis and Ethics
A Common Root of Empathy and Ethics
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The words “sympathy” and “empathy” can be distinguished in several ways. Some of these distinctions are controversial, and work is needed to make them more precise. For example, “sympathy” is frequently used to mean one person’s response to the negative affects (suffering) of another individual, leading to pro-social (helping) behavior towards the other. In contrast, “empathy” generally includes responding to positive affects as well as negative ones without, however, necessarily requiring doing anything about it (no pro-social behavior required). “Sympathy” is understood to include agreement or approbation whereas “empathy” is often, though by no means always, a relatively neutral form of data gathering about the experiences and affects of others. “Sympathy” means a specific affective response such as compassion or pity whereas “empathy” once again encompasses affects in general including negative ones such as anger, fear, or resentment.

The words “empathy” and “sympathy” both point to the ancient Greek root “pathos” in the etymological context of modern English (Partridge 1966/1977). “Pathos” in turn means to suffer in the sense of to endure, to undergo, or to be at the effect of. A single mention in Aristotle in the original Greek of empathes occurs in Aristotle’s On Dreams in which the coward experiences intense fear upon imagining that he sees his enemy approaching. In the original Greek, the references to empathes are few and marginal, generally meaning “in a state of intense emotion,” “passionate emotion,” or “much affected by,” a distinctly different meaning than it has today. The short list of other occurrences in antiquity is filled out by a single reference each in Plutarch’s Lives, in Flavius Jospheus Antiquitates Judaica, and Polybius Histories (entry on empathes in Liddell and Scott 1940).

In contrast, the number of references to “sympathy” is hundreds of entries long and is diverse, extending from Aeschylus, Aristophanes, Aristotle, Demosthenes, and frequently breaking though to the English in Shakespeare. The meanings include the constellation of ones that we would recognize including “agreement,” “pity,” “compassion,” “transmission of affect,” and “suggestibility.”

In the English language “empathy” simply did not exist prior to Cornell University psychologist Edward Bradford Titchner’s neologism in translating the German word “Einfühlung” as “empathy” in his lectures based on his work in the laboratory of Wilhelm Wundt (E. B. Titchener (1909)). Arguably the German is best captured by a phrase such as “feeling one’s way into,” but the advantages of a single word also have merit. Thus, it is technically an error, but one with an underlying kernel of truth, when one of the foremost researchers on empathy uses “empathy” as a substitute for “sympathy” as in the following from Hoffman: “And the British version of utilitarianism represented by David Hume, Adam Smith, and others for whom empathy was a necessary social bond, finds expression in current research on empathy, compassion, and the morality of caring” (2000: 2, 123). As noted, the word “empathy” did not exist in the English language when Hume (1739) and Smith (1759) write about engaging the foundations of morality in “sympathy,” the latter being the only word they used. Yet Hoffman captures an aspect of the truth as the word “sympathy” itself as used by Hume and Smith included the communicability of affect and emotional contagion, which today we would also count as inputs to “empathy” without, however, reducing empathy to emotional contagion and low level transmission of affect without remainder.

Prior to the arrival of the word “empathy” into the English language, “sympathy” captured the distinction “communicability of affect,” onto which additional meanings were layered. Hume and Smith are the main witnesses to this development. With the arrival of the word “empathy,” the difference between a method of data gathering about the experiences (sensations, affects, emotions) of other individuals and the use of this experience for ethically relevant processing, decision making, and evaluations was able to moved into the foreground.

Meanwhile, the Continental tradition reenacts in its own terms some of the same challenges in the German language that occurred around “sympathy” in the British tradition. Starting with Herder (1772/1792; see also Forster 2010: 19), and reaching to the 20^th century in the writings of the phenomenologists such as Husserl, Scheler, and Stein a group of terms around “fühlen” [to feel] was occurring. Thus: “mitfühlen,” to “feel with” or “sympathize” and “nachfühlen,” to “feel vicariously” or even “to feel after” as in an after-image of a feeling. All these semantic distinctions emerged alongside “einfühlen,” to “empathize” or “to feel one’s way into” (Scheler 1913/22; Forster 2010: 39). Wilhelm Dilthey dismissed Einfühlung in favor of nacherleben [reexperiencing, reliving], nachfühlen (and Verstehen [understanding]) (see Makkreel 1975: 6-7, 252, 290). However, the point where these two traditions intersect is precise. The German psychologist Theodor Lipps translated Hume’s Treatise of Human Nature into German (1739/1904 Hume/Lipps) even as Lipps was completing his own Aesthetik (1903). Lipps eventually published the translation of Hume in two volumes in 1904/1906. Without directly borrowing what Hume said about “sympathy,” Lipps made empathy (Einfühlung) into the foundation of his aesthetics and an account of other minds. While “sympathy” comes across into German as “sympathie,” the seed was planted for the close connection between sympathy and (aesthetic) taste that developed into an entire aesthetic (Lipps 1903) in which Einfühlung (empathy) plays the central role. An entire generation of thinkers, including Freud, Husserl, and Heidegger, was inhibited from using the precise term “empathy” [“Einfühlung”]. Further more, when they did use it in the context of overcoming otherness, they marginalized it. This was because they were reluctant to invoke echoes of Lipps’ psychology of beauty and art – as well as Lipps’s solipsistic reveries that the individual psyche is what animates and enlivens nature and other individual through projective empathy. Scheler got it accurate dismissing Lipps’ “projective empathy”.

One of the innovations in the use of “empathy” in the 1950s is by the psychoanalyst Heinz Kohut (1959, 1971, 1977, 1984; Goldberg 1999). Kohut’s use is based on his view of philosophy of science (see the Hartmann-Nagel debate (Hartmann, 1959; E. Nagel 1959)) rather than in any usage in Freud, who mostly neglected the word but not the underlying distinction (Trosman & Simmons 1972; Freud 1909 where Einfühlung is explicitly used). Kohut’s use of “empathy” is a method of data gathering oriented towards a listening-based immersion in the affective, experiential, and mental life of the other person. However, even in a relatively value neutral inquiry such as psychoanalysis, the use of empathy as a method of data gathering has turned out to be relevant to ethics. Issues arise around the coherence and integrity of character and the self as a bulwark against unethical behavior such as rampant cheating, drug abuse, gambling, moral malaise and other individual, social, and communal ills.

2. An Example and a Working Definition

In the parable of the Good Samaritan (Luke 10: 30-27), the Priest and the Levite cross the road and pass by the Jewish traveler who was robbed, beaten by thieves, and left for dead. The Samaritan (today that would be a local inhabitant, a Palestinian) stops to help the individual in need. Multiple, overlapping descriptions are available of the Samaritan as a would-be moral agent. For example: The Samaritan’s altruism was aroused. His sympathy was aroused. His empathy was aroused. In the case of those who crossed the road and passed by the victim without stopping, the experience of empathic distress was decisive (arguably). They experienced the other’s suffering and were overwhelmed by it. They handled the empathic experience of suffering by avoiding the situation. In the case of the Samaritan, the empathic distress was transformed into sympathetic distress (under one description (Hoffman 2000: 87-88)), which, in turn, motivated a pro-social, helping, altruistic intervention to aide the traveler. An entirely different description is available: ethics is fundamental in attributing the altruistic decision from the start to a fundamental recognition on the part of the Samaritan, answering the question, “Who is my neighbor?” The answer? The neighbor is the individual in need. By the end of this article, we shall not necessarily know which description is the truth with a capital “T,” but we shall have determined the terms of the debate and defined the issues in detail.

A working definition of “empathy” will be useful. At the level of phenomenal awareness of everyday human experience in the world with other humans, the minimal essential constituents of empathy include: (i) a receptivity (“openness”) to the affects of others whether in face-to-face encounter or as artifacts of human imagination (“empathic receptivity”); (ii) an understanding of the other in which the other individual is interpreted as a possibility—a possibility of choosing, making commitments, and implementing them (“empathic understanding”) in which the aforementioned possibility is implemented; (iii) an interpretation of the other from first-, second-, and third-person perspectives (“empathic interpretation”); and (iv) an articulation in language of this receptivity, understanding and interpretation, including the form of speech known as listening that enables the other to appreciate that he or she has been the target of empathy (“empathic listening”). In terms of the example of the Good Samaritan, the Samaritan is empathically receptive to the suffering of the traveler. This openness informs his understanding of the possibility that the other is a fellow traveler like himself. The other is interpreted as a neighbor (in the second person). This neighborliness is expressed in words and deeds by his stopping and altruistically giving assistance.

This working definition includes the possibility of alternative, orthogonal definitions, for example, from the perspective of functional causality. In the latter, another’s affects are the cause of mine in the context of a self-other distinction in which a causal construct such as a “shared manifold” is deployed below the threshold of introspective awareness in our biology (“neurology”) to explain the functions of perspective taking and emotional control (Gallese 2007). It is also consistent with a neuron-computational representation that uses mirror neurons to implement the transfer of affectivity from one individual to another (Jackson, Meltzoff, and Decety 2005; Decety & Jackson). It is consistent with a hermeneutic definition that deploys a double representation of the self’s representation of the other’s intentional fulfillment and the further processing of these representations (Agosta 2010; Husserl 1929/35; Stein 1917; Zahavi 2005). As we shall see, “sympathy” in Hume corresponds to at least two of these definitions of the communicability of affect and the ability to put oneself in the other’s place ((ideal) perspective taking). In addition, he has two definitions that do not overlap with empathy – a reactive response that is compassionate and caring towards another’s suffering and (as Hume uses it) the power of suggestion (to which we now turn).

3. The Anglo-American Tradition

a. Hume’s Many Meanings of “Sympathy”

David Hume has at least four distinct meanings of “sympathy.” These develop along with his thinking about the foundations of ethics. First, “sympathy” functions in the communicability of affect; next it encompasses what is often described as “emotional contagion,” the communicability of affect without the inclusion of the idea of the other individual as its source; additionally, it encompasses the power of suggestion; and, finally, it comes to include an element of benevolence. How this series of transformations unfolds is the topic of this story as the meaning of “sympathy” evolves from a communicability of affect to the responsive sentiment of compassion which is one of the essential ways that we regard sympathy today.

Always the astute phenomenologist, the philosopher, David Hume, witnesses the divergence of sympathy into components that will blend with the judgment of taste, taking on an irreversible dimension of evaluation, across both an ethical and aesthetic dimension. Other components identified by Hume develop into the form of human empathy known to us as the mere communicability of affect, subject to further cognitive processing. By the time Hume writes his 1741 essay “Of the delicacy of taste and passion,” he assimilates all the advantages for human interrelations of “sympathy” such as friendship, intimacy, interpersonal warmth to “delicacy of taste” (1741: 25-28; 1757: 3-24). Hume’s contribution to the transformations of sympathy has a significant subtlety and depth that deserves a substantial treatment of its own much longer than that engaged here.

By “sympathy” Hume does not initially mean the particular sentiments of pity or compassion or benevolence but rather the function of communicating affect in general. Relying on his simple psychology of ideas and impression, sympathy reverses the operation of the understanding, which converts impressions of sensation into ideas. In the case of sympathy, the operation is in the other direction – from idea to impression. Sympathy arouses ideas in the recipient that are transformed into impressions – though this time impressions of reflection – through the influence of the ideas. Thus, the operation of sympathy:

‘Tis indeed evident, that when we sympathize with the passions and sentiments of others, these movements appear at first in our mind as mere ideas, and are conceiv’d to belong to another person, as we conceive any other matter of fact. ‘Tis also evident, that the ideas of the affections of others are converted into the very impressions they represent, and that the passions arise in conformity to the images we form of them (T 2.1.11.8; SBN 319-20).

Sympathy reverses the operation of the understanding, which transforms impressions of sensation into ideas. Sympathy arouses impressions through the influence of ideas. The functional basis of this sympathetic conversion will turn out to be the imagination. In this view, sympathy is not to be mistaken with some particular affect such as pity or compassion, but is rigorously defined by Hume as “the conversion of an idea into an impression by the force of imagination” (T 2.3.6.8; SBN 427). The other’s anger gets expressed and is apprehended sympathetically as an idea, which idea is communicated to me, and, in turn, through the sympathetic work of the imagination, arouses a corresponding impression of my own. This is an impression of reflection that is fainter and calmer than the initial idea (or impression) of anger. (An “impression of reflection” is an impression of an idea or (in some cases) of a vivid impression.) I thus experience what may be variously described as a trace affect, a counter-part feeling, or a vicarious experience—of anger.

In short, the one individual now knows what the other is experiencing because she experiences it too, not as the numerically identical impression, but as one that is qualitatively similar. This operation of sympathy, at least in this example, is also crucially distinct from emotional contagion, as in the mass behavior of crowds, since the passion and sentiments are “conceived to belong to another person.” This is crucial. This introduces the other and the distinction between one individual and the other. Significantly, the concept of the other accompanies the impression that is aroused in the one individual as a result of the other’s expression.

Hume distinguishes between sympathy and emotional contagion (T 2.1.11.2; SBN 316-7; T 3.3.2.2; SBN 592). Sympathy requires a double representation. What the other is feeling is represented in a vicarious feeling, which is what sympathy shares with emotional contagion. However, sympathy in the full sense also requires a representation of the other as the source of the first representation, “conceived to belong to the other person” (T 2.1.11.8; SBN 319-20). The distinction “other” is what is missing in the case of emotional contagion.

Hume establishes sympathy as the glue that affectively binds others to oneself and, by implication, binds a community of ethical individuals together. One of the undisputed masters of the English language in his own day (and ours), Hume asserts that “the minds of men are mirrors to one another, not only because they reflect each others emotions, but also because those rays of passions, sentiments and opinions may be often reverberated and decay away by insensible degrees” (T 2.2.5.21; SBN 365). Here one does experience an immediate resonance (“reverberation”) with the other, perceiving pleasure in the smile, pain in the grimace, or anger in the clenched teeth. In this case, a counterpart feeling – a vicarious feeling – is aroused in oneself and, in turn, becomes the experiential basis for further cognitive activity about what is going on with the other person.

However, Hume finds now that he is at risk of having undercut ethics by giving to sympathy such a central role in creating community. Experience shows that sympathy is diminished by distance of time and proximity and relatedness (“acquaintance”). We are much less affected by the pleasures and pains of those at a great distance than by those in our immediate physical vicinity or (say) close family relations. So an earthquake in China creates less sympathetic distress in me than an earthquake in Los Angeles (in my own country), even if I am perfectly safe in either case. According to Hume, my ethical approbation of (and obligations to) those at a great distance from me are no less strong than to those close at hand. The balance of impartiality needs to be restored by appealing to an unbiased ideal observer. In turn, this sets up a tension between the sympathetic observer of the moral agent and the ideal, unbiased one. “Unbiased” does not mean “unsympathetic”; yet it does not mean “wholly sympathetic” either. This is an issue. The ideal observer and the sympathetic one are complementary at best, and possibly even contrary. Being sympathetic reduces distance between individuals; being an ideal observer creates distance. Let us now look at two possible ways of resolving the tension between the ideal observer and sympathy as the basis for moral approbation and disapproval. (Slote will have a third approach considered in detail further below.)

The first is due to Stephen Darwall’s reading of Hume as going beyond moral sentiment (at least implicitly) to rule regulation in accounting for such artificial virtues as justice and related convention-based virtues like adhering to contracts. Hume says that the motivation to justice is produced through sympathy in observing the beneficial results of justice (Darwall 1995: 314-5). Indeed Hume expresses what would become a very Kantian approach, though whether he does so consistently is an issue: “[W]e have no real or universal motive for observing the laws of equity but the very equity and merit of that observance” (SBN: 483). And: “’Tis evident we have no motive leading us to the performance of promises, distinct from a sense of duty. If we thought, that promises had no moral obligation, we never shou’d feel any inclination to observe them” (SBN 518; quoted in Darwall 1995: 302). It is easy to agree with Darwall’s general conclusion that Hume points towards the result that a virtue such as justice requires a rule-based obligation without explicitly embracing it, going beyond empirical naturalism, to account for justice. Through Darwall’s argumentative force, subtlety, and mastery of the details, both sympathy and the ideal observer are undercut, resulting in a Hume that reads much like Kant. This is not Hume’s point of view, though he anticipates and inspired Kant. Hume is not a closet Kantian. Sympathy is a source of information about the experience of the other individual. But that is not all. Hume’s commitment is that, in addition to the latter, sympathy is also a source of morality. Thus, Hume is constrained to evolve “sympathy” in the direction of “compassion” and “benevolence” to maintain his program. Darwall does not follow him there, but, as we shall see, it is a matter of controversy whether the modern account of empathy should do so.

The second approach is a reconstruction of the disinterested spectator as the sympathetic spectator. In other words, the key term “disinterested” means lacking a “conflict of interest,” not “unsympathetic” in the sense of “inhumanly cold-hearted”. The ideal spectator has to be sympathetic, not in the sense of benevolent (which “sympathy” has come to mean in part thanks to Hume’s usage), but in the sense of openness to the communicability of affect. Appreciating what the other is feeling is a useful, though not always decisive, data point in evaluating the ethical qualities of the agent being considered in the judgment of approbation. It makes a difference in contemplating the moral worth of someone making a charitable gift whether it is done with the feeling of pleasure in being better than the poor wretches who are its beneficiaries or with a trace feeling of the suffering of the other individual, which one’s gift might relieve. What the other is experiencing is useful input to the process of ethical assessment of the quality of character of the individual in question. As sympathy is enlarged in Hume beyond the narrow scope of one’s family and friends, it gives way to benevolence, an interest in the well-being of all mankind, as the basis of morality, while “sympathy” as a term used by Hume is trimmed back and reduced to emotional contagion.

Historically, what Hume does next is to develop his understanding (and definition) of “sympathy” in the direction of “benevolence.” “Sympathy” converges with benevolence as the latter supplements it in the founding of morality in an Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751). Without appreciating the consequences for his use of “sympathy,” Hume starts developing the idea in the direction of “benevolence,” the latter being specific benefits that interest us in the good of mankind:

‘Tis true, when the cause is compleat, and a good disposition is attended with good fortune, which renders it really beneficial to society, it gives a stronger pleasure to the spectator, and is attended with a more lively sympathy (T 3.3.1.21; SBN 585).

Virtue in rags is still virtue, as Hume famously notes, and sympathy interests us in the good of all mankind (“society”) (T 3.3.1.19; SBN 584), including communities distant from us in location or time. In answering the objection that “good intentions are not good enough for morality,” Hume argues back in so many words that good intentions are indeed good enough, granted that good intentions plus good consequences (results) are even better. However, “sympathy” has now taken on the content of benevolence, that is, an interest in furthering the well being of mankind, not just being open to man’s experiences, including suffering. By the time Hume’s Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals is published in 1751, “sympathy” has been downgraded to the power of suggestion, nothing more; and the basis of morality is shifted to such sentiments as benevolence, displaying qualities useful and agreeable to oneself and others.

In the following passage in Treatise, we witness Hume’s development of the meaning of “sympathy”. “Sympathy” migrates from a communicability of affect, which includes a concept of the other that aligns with the modern concept of “empathy,” towards a narrower, but not exclusive, sense of emotional contagion. Within the context of the Treatise, Hume builds a complete sense of sympathy out of the contagiousness of the passions by adding the idea of the other to the communicability of affect. In the Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals the contagiousness of the passions is all that will remain of sympathy:

‘Tis remarkable, that nothing touches a man of humanity more than any instance of extraordinary delicacy in love or friendship, where a person is attentive to the smallest concerns of his friend. . . The passions are so contagious, that they pass with the greatest facility from one person to another, and produce correspondent movements in all human breast. Where friendship appears in very signal instances, my heart catches the same passion, and is warmed by those warm sentiments, that display themselves me (T 3.3.3.5; SBN 604-5).

When put in context, this points to a remarkable development in Hume’s thinking. Hume moves sympathy from the center to the periphery of his account of human judgments (approbation and disapproval). This is complimented by the contrary movement of taste from the periphery to the center. The social advantages of sympathy in forming human relationships – friendship, enjoyment of the “characters of men,” fellow feeling, and sensitivity to how one’s actions have an impact on others – are shifted elsewhere, amazingly enough in the direction of the aesthetic sense of taste.

Hume explicitly writes:

Thus the distinct boundaries and offices of reason and of taste are easily ascertained. The former conveys the knowledge of truth and falsehood; the latter give the sentiment of beauty and deformity, vice and virtue (1751: 173f., 269; emphasis added).

Thus, Hume is engaging in what we might describe a journey back from morality to its foundation and infrastructure in taste. By 1751, “sympathy” has been reduced in Hume’s work to “natural sympathy,” which overlaps substantially with what we would today call “the power of suggestion”. The merit of benevolence and its utility in promoting the good of mankind through attributes useful and agreeable to oneself and others looms large in founding morality (for example, Hume 1751: 241).

By the time of the Enquiry (1751), the push down of “sympathy” behind compassion and taste is complete. The reactive aspects of “sympathy” get split off and migrate in the direction of compassion. Compassion takes on the content of qualities useful to mankind as benevolence. Taste dominates the field of fine-grained distinctions in the communicability of feelings between persons (“friends”) as well as in the appreciation of beauty. This former point is essential. Taste gives us an enjoyment of the qualities of the characters of persons in conversation, humor, and friendship that are a super-set of what empathy does today in our current usage with its fine-grained distinctions in accessing the experiences of other persons. The prospect of “delicacy of sympathy” in the social realm of human interrelations is left without further development by Hume. The true heir to Hume’s undeveloped “delicacy of sympathy”, without, however, explicitly having any idea of it, is the psychoanalyst Heinz Kohut whose transformations of empathy include humor, appreciation of art, and wisdom (Kohut 1966).

The other main witness to the vicissitudes of sympathy is Adam Smith, to whom we now turn.

b. Adam Smith’s Philosophy of Sympathy

Adam Smith explicitly distinguishes between sympathy and compassion (pity) in his 1759 The Theory of the Moral Sentiments. He also acknowledges a traditional overlap between the two, noting, however, the generalization of sympathy:

Pity and compassion are words appropriated to signify our fellow-feeling with the sorrow of others, sympathy, though its meaning was, perhaps, originally the same, may now, however, without much impropriety, be made use of to denote our fellow-feeling with any passion whatever (1759: 49).

Here sympathy is not some separate reactive affect that occurs in witnessing the pain and suffering of another individual. Rather sympathy operates as the communicability of affect (the passions) regardless of the particular passion. “Fellow feeling” is used as a high level category that enables Smith stylistically to suggest nuances and fine-grained distinctions in his phenomenological descriptions. An argument might be made that, when all is said and done, “sympathy” and “fellow feeling” are used synonymously by Smith. For example, in defining sympathy, Smith cannot use the same term without succumbing to the logical fallacy of petitio principi:

As we have no immediate experience of what other men feel, we can form no idea of the manner in which they are affected, but by conceiving what we ourselves should feel in the like situation [. . . . ] [I]t is by the imagination only that we can form any conception of what are his sensations [. . . .] By the imagination we place ourselves in his situation, we conceive ourselves enduring all the same torments, we enter as it were into his body, and become in some measure the same person with him, and thence form some idea of his sensation, and even feel something which, though weaker in degree, is not altogether unlike them. [. . . .] That this is the source of our fellow-feeling for the misery of others, that it is by changing places in fancy with the sufferer, that we come either to conceive or to be affected by what he feels, may be demonstrated by many obvious observations . . . (1759: 47-8)

In addition to using “fellow feeling” to define “sympathy,” the mechanism by which sympathy operates is the imagination. Specifically, it is the taking of the perspective of the other in the other’s situation. This points to three results.

(1) If “sympathy” is not synonymous with “fellow feeling,” then what is the difference? Sympathy is not responsive in the sense of pity or compassion, the latter being reactions to the suffering of another. Yet sympathy has its responsive dimension. Sympathy requires a responsive approbation or disapprobation of the beneficial or mischievous conduct of the other individual. In Smith, sympathy is fellow feeling plus (dis)approbation:

That where there is no approbation of the conduct of the person who confers the benefit, there is little sympathy with the gratitude of him who receives it: and that, on the contrary, where there is no disapprobation of the motives of the person who does the mischief, there is no sort of sympathy with the resentment of him who suffers it (1759: 143; chapter abstract).

This is a definitive textual answer. Of course, “little sympathy” is perhaps distinct from “absolutely and positively no sympathy”. But this is just understatement for effect. Sympathy is simply missing in the case of an unmerited boon conferred by a would-be benefactor. The bounds of (dis)approbation align closely with those of sympathy. Ultimately, sympathy is the basis of the moral sentiments for Smith because “to sympathize with” means “to align with the estimation of right or wrong based on fellow feeling”. The nuances that arise are many and varied; but Smith is more consistent than he is generally credited in standardly using sympathy as the source of intuitions about the merit (or demerit) of other individuals. This extends not only to their conduct but in the heartfelt attitude they bring to the conduct and its consequences. When we sympathize with the other – approving or disapproving based on the other’s perspective (not one’s own) – then we are aligned with the values of the shared community, especially the community of well-bred English gentlemen. When sympathy breaks down, when we have no fellow feeling with the other, then it is a strong indication that the other has put himself outside the community and is blameworthy, lacking merit. The result is an ethics of the well-bred English gentleman, including his attachments to reputation, prudence, temperance, and so on.

In addition, Smith’s spectator-like perspective aligns with that of the second person in contrast with Hume’s which has a closer resemblance to that of the third person. Stephen Darwall is keenly aware of this and makes the point: “It is not far wrong, indeed, to think of Smith as one of the first philosophers of the ‘second person,’ if not the very first” (Darwall 2006: 46). In many contexts, especially those is which (dis)approbation is not the main issue, Smith’s use of “sympathy” is indistinguishable from “communicability of affect”. This has led some commentators to equate Smith’s use of “sympathy” with empathy pure-and-simple. Thus Darwall, keenly aware of his own second person inquiry:

I prefer to use ‘sympathy’ for feelings of concern for others that are felt, not entirely as from their own point of view, but as from a third-person perspective of one who cares for them, and to use ‘empathy’ for feelings that either imaginatively enter into the other’s standpoint or result from his feelings by contagion (Darwall 2006: 45).

Of course, Darwall’s previous point is that Smith’s usage (unlike Hume’s) is precisely to take the second person perspective. Therefore, for Darwall, Smith’s usage of “sympathy” requires revision to equate “sympathy” with the third-person perspective, leaving room to rewrite the text using “empathy”. However, Darwall arguably overlooks the point indicated in the above-cited quote that, for Smith, sympathy is fellow-feeling plus (dis)approbation, not fellow feeling pure-and-simple.

(2) Do we merely “conceive what we ourselves should feel in the like situation” or are we allowed (or even required) to take on the characteristics of the other in so far as we are able to do so? This is similar to the question “How complete is the identification with the other?” While the above-cited text suggests that the one individual carries his or her characteristics into the situation of the other, the analysis does not stop there. To be sure, a person never completely stops being himself; yet the meta-rule is to put oneself in the other’s situation with the other’s character and circumstance:

But though sympathy is very properly said to arise from an imaginary change of situations with the person principally concerned, yet this imaginary change is not supposed to happen to me in my own person and character, but in that of the person with whom I sympathize. When I condole with you for the loss of your only son, in order to enter into your grief, I do not consider what I, a person of such a character and profession, should suffer, if I had a son, and if that son was unfortunately to die; but I consider what I should suffer if I was really you; and I not only change circumstances, but I change persons and characters. My grief, therefore, is entirely upon your account, and not in the least upon my own. It is not, therefore, in the least selfish (1759: 501-2).

We imagine what it would be like to be the other person with the other’s character. The ideal spectator runs a cognitive simulation in which one may indeed begin with one’s own characteristics as input, but quarantines one’s own peculiarities in favor of those of the other. To be sure, such an exercise is bound to be imperfect and incomplete. There is a strong identification, yet it remains transient, temporary, and incomplete. At that point, sentiments of approbation or disapprobation emerge, which inform the individual’s moral assessment of the situation and the other person in it.

(3) What is involved in feeling what the other feels, yet not approving of it? Smith allows an extensive continuum of degrees of fellow feeling, reaching from a slight hint of what the other is feeling to full blown identification. Sympathy mostly falls in the middle of this spectrum, a transient and trial identification with the other, soon interrupted. The one individual feels what the other feels, yet not quite as intensely. It seems as though there ought to be a logical space for the possibility of fellow feeling without sympathetic (dis)approbation, given that these are not completely synonymous. Yet it does not seem to occur to Smith to allow it. Consider the situation of the condemned criminal about to be hanged.

When an inhuman murder is brought to the scaffold, though we have some compassion for his misery, we can have no sort of fellow-feeling with his resentment, if he should be so absurd as to express any against either his prosecutor or his judgment (1759: 145).

Indeed we adopt the sentiments of the prosecutor and judgment. Taking a hint from Smith’s language here, we can say that the criminal has placed himself outside the limits of the human community with his murderous deeds, a human community from which he is about to be ejected by being hanged. The lesson learned here is that we may have compassion for lower forms of life, but sympathy is arguably co-extensive with the human and defines the foundation of our participation in the community. For Smith, “sympathize with” is synonymous with “align with the other’s feeling in such a way as to approve or disapprove along with the other” (not a quote from Smith, but Smith’s bottom line).

c. Contractualism and Sympathy in Rawls

John Rawl’s magisterial A Theory of Justice (1971) contains sections on features of the moral sentiments and moral psychology, including a discussion of sympathy and the impartial sympathetic spectator. After the parties in a would-be society have adopted the principles of justice as fairness in the original position, the result is Kantian. Natural abilities such as strength, intelligence, inherited gifts, are unevenly distributed to individuals but are a collective asset so that the more fortunate are to benefit in ways that help those who are least well endowed. Inequalities are arranged for reciprocal advantage. By abstaining from the exploitation of the accidents of nature and social contingencies with the framework of equal liberty and the difference principle, persons express their respect for one another in the constitution of society itself (Rawls 1971: 179). Can this capture the utilitarian approach of the impartial, sympathetic spectator? At first it seems that it can:

Now while it is possible to supplement the impartial spectator definition with the contract point of view, there are other ways of giving it a deductive basis. Thus suppose that the ideal observer is thought of as a perfectly sympathetic being. Then there is a natural derivation of the classical principle of utility along the following lines. An institution is right, let us say, if an ideally sympathetic and impartial spectator would approve of it more strongly than any other institution feasible in the circumstances. For simplicity we may assume, as Hume sometimes does, that approval is a special kind of pleasure [. . . ] This special pleasure is the result of sympathy. In Hume’s account it is quire literally a reproduction in our experience of the satisfactions and pleasures which we recognize to be felt by others [. . . .] Men’s natural capacity for sympathy suitably generalized provides the perspective from which they can reach an understanding on a common conception of justice. (1971: 185-6)

In either case, contractual or utilitarian, the argument moves in the direction of fairness and equilibrium; yet the original (contractual) position more accurately captures the human condition – namely, that individuals have distinct abilities and gifts. In Rawl’s original position, the parties are behind the “veil of ignorance,” disinterested and lacking knowledge of their natural abilities or social situation. Inequalities are just only if they result in compensating benefits for everyone. In contrast, the classical utilitarians have perfect knowledge and sympathetic identification. Both result in a correct estimate of the net sum of satisfaction. But classical utilitarianism fails to distinguish between persons, in effect collapsing distinct persons with distinct abilities into a one dimensional, impartial sympathetic spectator. The parties in the original position would not agree to the approvals of the impartial sympathetic spectator as the standard of justice, according to Rawls. Why not? Such a spectator does not have access to the concept of risk – the risk that one might be born poor and marginalized rather than (say) rich and in the main stream. It simply is not captured. The veil of ignorance is designed to yield principles of justice as fairness whereby, even if your antipathetic enemy is choosing what role you will play in society (presumably you will end up poor and with limited natural abilities), the advantages that the other party has will be distributed in such a way as to contribute to everyone’s advantage. In contrast, for the impartial sympathetic spectator to yield justice as fairness, the parties are conceived as perfect altruists, whose desires conform to the approvals of such a spectator. “The greater net balance of happiness with which to sympathize, the more a perfect altruist achieves his desire” (1971: 189). In fact, the world is filled with individuals with competing interests, who, moreover, are antipathetic (hostile) to one another, and the utilitarian aligns everyone’s interests in a most counter-intuitive way. Justice is not necessary unless individuals are antipathetic and the interests of individuals come into conflict, the actual situation of the real world. In a world of conflicting interests, sympathy still has a role to play in transmitting affects, but it is not foundational. Is there then a logical space between self-interest and duty to account for the relationship between empathy and altruism?

d. Nagel’s Incomplete Version of Empathy

In Nagel’s argument, the interest of others in the world and one’s own interest are in balance. It is not that the world comes ahead of one’s own – which, arguably, would look like utilitarianism and the greatest good of the greatest number. Although consequences are inevitably a part of the description of the ethical dilemma, the determination of interest is not exclusively reducible to the consequential calculation. Rather we are looking formally and logically at the priority of one’s own interest over against that of the other individuals in the world, and one’s own interest does not have any more priority. But it does not necessarily have any less, for the majority of the world would not be justified in inflicting pain on one individual even if it resulted in their greater good anymore than one individual would be justified in doing so to the majority. Is there a logical space available to establish a link between empathy and the austere ethics of duty (deontology) based on the structure of action? This is needed to avoid succumbing to the reactivity of moral sentiments (shame, guilt, benevolence, compassion, and so on). These are powerful motivators of moral behavior, and as such deserve cultivation, but are logically dubious founders of it.

This argument enables Thomas Nagel (1970) in effect to say “Act so as to reduce the pain (of persons) in the world.” Depending on one’s perspective, this is a special case by way of generalization of the self-interested maxim to “act so as to reduce my own pain” along with “I am in the world with others” and “we are all others (persons)”. For example, in being altruistic, both my own pain and that of the other are regarded impersonally. Actions that reduce my pain remain self-interested in an obvious way – I am no longer in pain. Acts that reduce the pain of the other are just an impersonal version of my acting to reduce the pain experienced personally.

The next step was not taken by Nagel who elsewhere disparages a version of empathy based on an incomplete and misleading definition. Nagel calls for “an objective phenomenology not dependent on empathy or the imagination” (1974: 402); but this phenomenology may turn out to be inconsistent with his commitment to finite human understanding. Without empathy and the imagination, the bat’s experience becomes the inaccessible thing in itself (ding an sich). The bat is the one who does not know what it is like to be a bat, since the bat lacks my concept of battiness (not to mention such distinctions as echo-location, flying mouse, and mammal). In Nagel 1970 he writes: “Any justification ends finally with the rationally gratuitous presence of the emotion of sympathy; if that condition were not met, one would simply have no reason to be moral” (1970: 11). Here “sympathy” means “pity” or “compassion” or “benevolence,” rather than the possibility of communicating any possible affect or sensation, which was Hume’s initial and primary meaning of “sympathy” (see Hume 1739: 319).

Yes, I should so act to reduce the pain in the world, including the other’s and my own too. But how do I know the other is in pain? The answer is empathy. In any particular situation and with apologies to Kant, altruism without empathy (sympathy) is like a concept without intuition. The vicarious experience of the other’s pain and the processing of it in empathic receptivity and interpretation is an essential part of how the would-be altruist comes to know of the other’s distress. This does not mean I cannot be wrong. It means that I can advance from the possibility of altruism to its implementation in actual situations through marshalling, capturing, and organizing the evidence of interrelational receptivity through empathy. Having established then that empathy provides an essential input to ethical altruism, is it perhaps capable of being elaborated into a foundation for an ethics of caring?

e. Empathy as a Moral Criterion in Slote’s Ethics of Caring

Michael Slote (2007, 2010) finds in empathy the basis for an ethics of caring that provides the basis for a moral sentimentalism. Drawing mainly on Hume, with an occasional nod to Smith, Slote shifts the analysis from an evaluation of behavior to the moral worth of agents engaging in action. One’s ability to empathize defines the boundary of the human community or as Slote puts it (2010: 13) provides “cement of the moral universe”. Slote finds significant inspiration in Hutcheson’s idea of a moral sense of approval or disapproval. Slote then substitutes empathy for that moral sense, however, with significant conditions and qualifications (2010: 33-4). Slote argues that empathy provides an “understandable mechanism for moral approval and disapproval” (2010: 33), lending philosophic rigor to the mere metaphor of moral sense. Slote claims to identify a second order empathy:

In particular, if agents’ actions reflect empathic concern for (the well-being or wishes of) others, empathic beings will feel warmly or tenderly toward them, and such warmth and tenderness empathically reflect the empathic warmth or tenderness of the agents. I want to say that such (in one sense) reflective feeling, such empathy with empathy, also constitutes moral approval, and possibly admiration as well, for agents and/or their actions (2010: 34-5).

Let us return to our paradigm example of the Good Samaritan and see how this works. We are fine as long as the Good Samaritan, for example, feels warmly or tenderly towards the traveler who was waylaid by robbers and left for dead. Empathy is properly understood as requiring a communicability of affect between the rescuer and the observer – in this case Slote or the ideal observer – who approve or disapprove of the moral worth of the agent. Of course, we can contingently imagine that the Samaritan, in the act of helping the stranger, recognizes that what he is doing has significant value, acknowledging himself for his good character and producing a warm feeling, whether of self-approval or mere self-recognition. This warm feeling of the Samaritan, in turn, becomes the target for the empathy of the ideal observer, who experiences a trace affect of it. However, the example works less well if the Samaritan is too busy helping the other to consider self-recognition or –acknowledgement. Even more, the example works not at all if the Samaritan, who is actually a Palestinian, sees that the victim is a Hebrew settler, but, in spite of their being sworn enemies, he recognizes the suffering humanity through a trace affect of suffering disclosed in his empathic receptivity, and decides, in spite of his antipathic negative feeling, to come to the traveler’s aid, not because of any feeling but because that is what duty requires of him. Ambivalence is not a problem and is likely in most scenarios (see Greenspan 1980).

Further issues loom for Slote with altruism, which is considered in more detail in his first empathy book, which complements the later one consistently (2007, 2010). Thus, he distinguishes empathy as a method of accessing the experiences of the other from specific emotions such as compassion, pity, love, and so on. However, Slote then mixes empathy with altruism: “A person who is fully empathic with and concerned about others will sometimes give up something that she wants in order to help another person gain something good” (Slote 2007: 116). In this context, Slote points out that this “give up something” is not irrational. Indeed it is not. This sounds like altruism because that is what it is. Only if “rationality” is mistaken for one’s own narrow self-interest (not Slote’s problem), whether long or short term, does it become impossible to help others without falling into unqualified egoism. In general, when, on the basis of empathy, a person does something to help another person, the helping shows up as a form of altruism. Thus Slote:

The criterion offered [. . .] in terms of empathic caring was a moral criterion, a criterion of moral permissibility, and when I spoke of supererogation, I was again speaking in specifically moral terms. In that sense, too, the empathically caring individual can be characterized as possessing (a) moral virtue, and I think it is fair to say that the present book has been primarily interested in the moral aspect of the ethics of care (Slote 2007: 118).

The moral aspect of the ethics of caring is precisely empathy, according to Slote. However, contra Slote, empathy does not require that one do anything other than listen empathically and talk empathically in response, thus falling short of the practical caring (for example, serving dinner) intended here by Slote. Indeed a quiet, rich empathic silence is often sufficient. If one decides to take action on the basis of empathy, then the action may be altruistic if the beneficiary is a stranger or the action may be caring (in the narrow sense of feeding one’s own hungry child) if the beneficiary is someone “near and dear,” who one is obligated to attend to in any case. Thus, it is important to distinguish directly helping others by caring for their physical needs, feeding the hungry, binding up the wounds of the injured, sheltering the injured traveler, and so on, and empathizing with the other in such a way to allow the other to regain their emotional equilibrium when it has been lost or upset (admittedly by traumas and suffering). If a person telling a moving story is moved to tears in the course of the narrative, strictly speaking, offering the individual a tissue to dry his eyes is an action. However, it is a largely symbolic gesture that says “I recognize the human suffering and wish to comfort it” rather than an action such as that of the Roman Centurion who cuts his cloak in half and gives it to the freezing beggar.

It is a useful rule of thumb that altruism ministers to one’s physical (bodily) needs whereas empathy responds to and is aroused by a person’s emotional and affective expressions of animate life. The two can diverge dramatically. For example, after the fall of the Soviet Union Rumanian orphanages were understaffed, bare bones institutions that rigged up mechanical, assembly line-like ways of delivering bottled milk to infants, like feeders in a bird cage. The results were the production of symptoms developmentally similar to neurological damage, autism, and infantile psychosis (M. A. Diego and N. A. Jones 2007: 161; Spitz 1946). Many of these symptoms were able to be reversed by adoptive, caring, nurturing parents, but, depending on the duration of the neglect, not all.

Much is made of the short circuiting of action in and by empathy by professional practitioners of empathy. This is due to the uses of empathy in psychotherapy, counseling, and psychoanalysis. In such situations, it would be counterproductive, if not harmful, for the therapist actively to intervene altruistically in the client’s life with specific maxims and advice about what to do. Psychotherapy activates many boundaries between therapist and client, including ethical ones and ones of action. Psychotherapy provides a counter-example to Slote. Neither therapeutic empathy nor empathic distress are a motive for action, though they can clarify the context of action or provide insight into both reasons and causes. If one grasps aspects of the other and his situation through empathy, then one may discover reasons that one did not know were relevant or engaged by his character or that character in a particular situation.

Next, going beyond imperfect duties such as altruism to perfect ones, Slote offers a general criterion of right and wrong action based in the notion of empathy – specifically empathic caring or concern for others:

[. . . ] One can claim that actions are morally wrong and contrary to moral obligation if, and only if, they reflect or exhibit or express an absence (or lack) of fully developed empathic concern for (or caring about) others on the part of the agent (2007: 31).

Slote proposes that empathy – more precisely, “empathic caring” – is a moral criterion. Are we then obligated to strive to develop our empathy (empathic caring) so that we are equal to the criterion? Slote does not explicitly assert that we are obligated to develop our empathy; yet without empathy we do not flourish as humans.

Slote asserts that he does not advocate implementing an obligation to be empathic. However, this risks getting stranded on the horns of a dilemma. First of all, such an obligation (Slote asserts) would set a bar too high for most people, given that we do not get training in empathy, and so risk violating the “ought implies can” injunction. That is, we cannot create an obligation, which we know in advance that we cannot live up to. Yet if we are to advance to “fully developed empathic concern” do we not have an obligation to develop empathy even if it is not required in any particular situation? At the very least, empathy would be an “imperfect duty to self and others” similar to developing one’s talents and gifts – empathy, humor, charity, wisdom – and using them to create community and a flourishing society.

“Fully developed empathic concern” is doing a lot of the work for Slote here. It will contain all the conditions and qualifications required to restrict empathic concern from requiring supererogatory deeds. Empathic concern does not. Empathic concern includes those geographically remote, and excluding them would unfairly subject them to violations of obligations. Empathic concern allows for the development of empathy in those whose initial (“natural”) endowments of it may be less generous than the average individual (practice improves talent). The argument is instructive and useful – as well as ad hoc.

In order to preserve empathy as a moral criterion, even against these issues, Slote argues against describing empathy as partialist (favoring those “near and dear”). Slote argues against the common sense intuition that people initially seem to have less empathy towards those who are different – different race (skin color), different religion, different gender, different diet than those to whom one is partial such as one’s family (2007: 35). Unfortunately, distrust seems to be the default attitude towards strangers, and often with good reason. Therefore, in a reaction formation meant to manage mistrust, many traditional cultures make it obligatory to shelter and protect guests. What better way than carefully to keep watch over them than to declare they are “guests”?

It is a further question of how the example of the Good Samaritan affects our own empathic receptivity as potential (ideal) observers of the would-be moral agent. In observing the suffering of the victim of the robbers as well as observing the Samaritan’s empathic suffering with the victim, we (as observers) have several empathic experiences. Like the Samaritan, we empathize directly with the distress of the victim. We also experience the suffering of the Samaritan who experiences a double pain. The Samaritan experiences first the vicarious experience (pain) of the suffering of the victim. In addition, the Samaritan experiences the pain experienced in sacrificing his own time, effort, and money in interrupting his (the Samaritan’s) trip, binding up the victims wounds, and leaving him with the Inn Keeper, promising to pay for any additional expenses upon his return. If the Samaritan gives himself credit for his good deed, in effect saying to himself “I acknowledge myself as an agent for doing the right thing in a tough spot,” then we (as observers) can arguably also have an empathic experience of the warm feeling of that self acknowledgement. Slote finds in this experience a second order empathy (Slote 2010: 39) that contains a warm feeling of approval. Slote then finds in this experience an important contribution to the moral basis of an ethics of caring. Some critics find this second order empathy to be a mis-description of the phenomenon, mistaking a response of what Hoffman calls “sympathetic distress” towards the suffering of the other for empathy (Hoffman 2000: 87-8). Indeed Hoffman, who is consistently cited by Slote with agreement, clearly distinguishes “empathic distress” from “sympathetic distress,” granted that Slote does not use such a distinction. For empathy to become an input to morality, it is first transformed from “empathic distress” into “sympathetic distress,” at which point the latter can become the motive for pro-social (altruistic) behavior such as the Samaritan’s (Hoffman 2000: 87-88).

It is a matter of controversy that empathy includes a warm feeling of approval (as asserted by Slote 2010: 36-41). Slote implicitly lines up with Rawls where approval provides a special kind of pleasure, granted that Rawls (like Hume) restricts the argument to “sympathy” (Rawls 1971: 185-6). Approval or disapproval is not the only ethical response possible. Empathy is distinct from (ethical) approval in that it gives rise to a whole host of downstream responses (reactions). As distinct from empathy, certain forms of antipathy can also be marshaled as when a (hostile) enemy of the traveler experiences Schadenfreude (delight at someone’s misfortune) upon witnessing the latter’s misfortune. Indeed what makes the parable so powerful and dramatic is that the Samaritan (Palestinian) is actually the enemy of the victim, but through empathy recognizes suffering humanity and then in a separate decision acts ethically and humanely like a neighbor, not an enemy.

Thus, the altruistic person must frequently deal with overcoming empathic distress – that is, a too intensely felt experience of the other’s pain that goes beyond a vicarious experience of pain and becomes the individual’s own pain pure-and-simple (Hoffman 2000: 87-8). Empathic distress can become so intense that one tries to flee from the situation rather than engaging other alternatives such as helping. Under this interpretation, instead of just being hard-hearted (which remains a possibility in principle), empathic distress is what happened to the first two would-be helpers who passed by the victim/traveler, crossing the road due to this empathic distress in order to put distance between themselves and the source of suffering.

However, one may object, does this not raise the bar too high on altruism? Altruism occasions a triple pain. It now produces three episodes of pain – first the initial distress (for example) of traveler waylaid and beaten by robbers; second, the vicarious experience of the victim’s pain as experienced by the would-be Good Samaritan; and finally the sacrifice (pain) incurred by the Samaritan in aiding the victim. Of course, if successful, altruism eliminates the initial suffering of the victim and by implication the vicarious pain in which the Good Samaritan is empathically connected to the target of altruism. This leaves altruism only with whatever pain is caused by the cost and effort incurred in aiding the victim. In contrast, empathy is left with the initial suffering, the vicarious experience of pain, and the question of what, if anything, to do about the suffering disclosed by one’s empathy. Of course, one possible answer is to act altruistically. Alternatively, one could also simply cross over – cross the road – and pass by. Thus, in answer to the objection that this analysis through empathy sets the bar too high for altruism, the answer is direct. Altruism is indeed a high bar; but one which we are challenged by and, with ethical effort, able to surmount. Empathy tells us what the other is experiencing; altruism what to do about it.

4. The Continental Tradition

The Anglo-American and Continental traditions (neither of which is homogeneous in themselves) have enjoyed an expanding exchange of views in comparison with past periods when each tradition tended to maintain its own island of ideas. Still, the Continental tradition has its own voice and views on empathy and ethics. Three topics have arguably have been the target of a more dedicated inquiry from the Continental side: Nietzsche’s empathic sense of smell as a compliment to his philosophy of suspicion, especially in On the Genealogy of Morals (1887); the Holocaust, especially as interpreted by Hannah Arendt; and the role of the Other (with a capital “O”), especially in Levinas (1961). None of these topics are exclusively the domain of Continental thinking, but are rather invoked here as witnesses of a distinctly Continental contribution.

a. Nietzsche’s Empathy of Smell Complements His Suspicion

Although the word “Einfühlung” does not occur in Nietzsche, his approach is arguably an empathic one, especially as empathy activates the primitive sense of smell. Nietzsche’s status as an outsider, as an individual of the limit experience (Grenzerfahrung), informs his sense of smell – and his empathy – with the dynamics of moral sentimentalism in a fundamental way. Nietzsche’s empathy informs his suspicion time-and-again. Empathy functions as a complement to the method of suspicion. Nietzsche feels – and smells – more acutely and distinctly than the various persons that are intermittently the target of his debunking – the scholar (scientist), artist, priest, last man, the mass (herd) man, even the higher man. For example, behind the moral prescription of “love of one’s neighbor” lies the ascetic priest’s antidote to depression, namely, the performance of petty pleasures of doing (minor) acts of kindness to those who are less fortunate. Nietzsche’s empathy detects the petty pleasure as a trace affect, which, in turn, feeds his suspicion. Nietzsche detects the will to power in a cautious dose of the petty pleasure of doing a good deed that costs the doer nothing and benefits the recipient equally little, but has the result of disclosing a happiness of “slight superiority” (1887: Third Essay, Section 18).

For Nietzsche, the sense of smell functions empathically in disclosing a mostly unsuspected trace of weariness. Suspicion is frequently called out as being essential to Nietzsche’s debunking of established bourgeois morals and iconoclasm towards cherished values. Christian ethics, the love of Saint Paul (“agape”), and their implementation by the Church of Rome, are not what they seem to be according to the Christian account. Once called out, Nietzsche experiences what Hoffman calls “empathic distress” at the leveling and mediocrity from which contemporary man suffers – the emptiness, apathy, malaise, and depression – in short, the nihilism of which the average man is mostly unaware but from which he too suffers. However, Nietzsche does not take the next step to “sympathetic distress” (Hoffman 2000: 87-8). Instead this underlying suffering is transmitted via emotional contagion through the sense of smell as further input to Nietzsche’s empathic processing: “Bad air, bad air! The approach of some ill-constituted thing, that I have to smell the entrails of some ill-constituted soul” (1887: First Essay, Section 11). Behind the Christian love of the “meek that inherit the earth” Nietzsche’s empathy discovers a trace affect of ressentiment; behind the anti-Semitism of the Church of Rome lies the vengefulness and hatred of slave morality. What passes for virtue is lack of opportunity for badness. Undertaking an inquiry into the formation of ideals such as the Christian “Last Judgment,” “the Kingdom of Heaven,” and [Christian] “faith, hope, and love,” using his empathy, Nietzsche discovers an empathic trace affect of “the intoxication of sweet revenge.” His suspicion then uses these traces to unmask pretensions. All the while, rhetorically exclaiming, “I’ll open my ears again (Oh! Oh! Oh! And close my nose)” (1887: First Essay, Section 14).

Nietzsche’s empathic debunking continues. He quotes from Dante and the Church Father Tertullian that the pleasures of the blessed in heaven will be enhanced by watching from above the tortures of those who are damned in Hell. Not empathy but rather what has come to be called, even in English, “Schadenfreude” – an enjoyment (Freude) at the damages (Schaden) being done to another. Yet even Schadenfreude implies an empathic communication of affect, since the observer’s enjoyment is enhanced by a deep grasp of the suffering of the damned, an appreciation enhanced by a trace affect of the suffering. However, the relationship of Schadenfreude to empathy is one of reactive antipathy. Schaenfreude like sympathy is reactive. In addition to the communication of affect, it includes a response to what is transmitted. Instead of approval or disapproval as in the case of sympathy, the response in Schadenfreud is one of enjoyment at the suffering of the other.

Bad conscience (guilt) seems like a mark of advancing civilization. However, suspicion fulfilled by empathy discloses otherwise. “Bad conscience” is an illness. The more advanced the civilization, the more advanced the guilt. This illness (bad conscience) is hostility, cruelty, destructiveness turned against oneself. This causes “the gravest and uncanniest illness, from which humanity has not yet recovered, man’s suffering of man” (1887: Essay Two, Section 16).

Individuals who escape bad conscience are rare. We can at least envision the possibility in figures in literature such as Achilles, Faust, or Nietzsche’s own cipher Zarathustra, the latter in his better moments of recovery from the great contempt. Nietzsche drives forward his empathic inquiry into the suffering of modern persons and their ideals by a debunking of ascetic ideals. Following his nose – and his empathy – Nietzsche calls again, “And therefore let us have fresh air! fresh air! And keep clear of the madhouse and hospitals of culture!” (1887: Third Essay, Section 14). The result? The priest does not discharge the ressentiment of the modern mass of men, leading their lives of silent desperation and suffering; rather the priest alters the direction of the ressentiment and turns it against the individual: “This is brazen and false enough: but one thing at least is achieved by it, the direction of ressentiment is altered” (1887: Third Essay, Section 16). In conclusion, using a suspicion informed by empathy, Nietzsche famously asserts the position: man would rather will nothing than not will, setting the stage for nihilism. Nietzsche’s empathy points to hidden (and not so hidden) suffering in unexpected places – art, science, religion, philosophy, and, above all, morals. However, in every case, a pattern emerges. Empathy complemented by suspicion shows that it is not so much suffering that man dreads as suffering’s meaninglessness. Thus, ascetic ideals give meaning to man’s suffering by holding out asceticism as a path to something higher. However, some events defy both suffering and meaning and leave us numb, like a deer in the headlights. We now turn to one such event.

b. The Challenge to Empathy of the Event of the Holocaust

The Holocaust represents a challenge to our empathy as we try to grasp the meaning of historic event from afar in anguished, benumbed remembrance. We can grasp the killing of a single individual as a crime and the killing of many as an even more serious crime. We are challenged to grasp the mutual slaughter of armies on fields of battle in the bloodbath known as “history,” but tentatively rise to the occasion as in Tolstoy’s account of the Battle of Borodino, Crane’s The Red Badge of Courage, or even Boden’s Black Hawk Down. But the systematic, bureaucratized, automated destruction of the Jewish population of Europe by the Nazis between 1938 and 1945 is a challenge to our empathy for so many reasons. It remains one of the defining events of post modern ethics. If we cannot empathize with it, we cannot imagine it. If we cannot imagine it, we cannot punish it. If we cannot punish it, we cannot forgive it. We are burdened with it in a way that defines, chokes, and diminishes our humanity. We are stuck with it in a way that defines, chokes, and diminishes what is possible for human beings; but in the face of which we have to go forward into possibility nonetheless. It is important to note this was accompanied by and included the extrajudicial killing of other “life unworthy of life” such as the mentally ill and retarded, gypsies, gays, communists, uncooperative members of other religious and political parties. However, the racial laws and anti-Semitic ideology that specifically preceded the event, targeting Jewish people, make it their Holocaust in a special and unhappy way.

Grasping these ideas require putting one’s thoughts and sensibility in a place that they usually do not venture. In the early days of World War II and prior to the automation of killing in the death factories such as Auschwitz, it was difficult for soldiers and paramilitaries to kill people for eight hours a day by shooting them. However, continuous killing is what was required of the Nazis soldiers when there are so many people to kill. That was what the so-called special intervention groups [Einsatzgruppen] had to do. In addition, it is difficult to watch people suffering over so long a period of time, especially if you have insufficient bullets to shoot or gas them all immediately. This is a challenge for any approach to genocide, even after the intended victims have been marked with a yellow star or otherwise “branded,” equated with vermin, insects, and dehumanized. On the street, people still look like humans when we confront them face-to-face or even face-to-back. The misuse of the Nazi concept of duty, which only superficially resembles a deontological one, has been often noted. It occurs again here and should never be mentioned without being challenged. Briefly, the fallacy consists in making an exception for a subset of humans, thus contradicting one’s own humanness. Even formally, the good Nazi morally contradicts himself – a consistency in shooting only one or a few types of persons (in addition to Jews – gypsies, communists, Catholic converts, gays, mentally retarded, physically disabled – the list grows tellingly) – is inconsistency pure-and-simple. Arendt is worth quoting at length:

. . . The murders were not sadists or killers by nature; on the contrary, a systematic effort was made to weed out all those who derived physical pleasure from what they did. The troops of the Einsatzgruppen [responsible for shooting] had been drafted from the Armed S.S., a military unit with hardly more crimes in its record than any ordinary unit of the German Army, and their commanders had been chosen by [Chief Commander] Heydrich from the S.S. elite with academic degrees. Hence the problem was how to overcome not so much their conscience as the animal pity by which all normal men are affected in the presence of physical suffering. The trick used by Himmler – who apparently was rather strongly afflicted with these instinctive reasons himself – was very simple and probably very effective; it consisted in turning these instincts around, as it were, in directing them toward the self. So that instead of saying: What horrible things I did to people! the murderers would be able to say: What horrible things I had to watch in the pursuance of my duties, how heavily the task weighed upon my shoulders (Arendt 1971: 105-6).

While life is filled with moral ambiguities and difficult ethical choices, this is hardly one of them. What was done was wrong and to be condemned in the strongest terms. Nor is lack of empathy what represents the moral problem. It is the killing.

What made it easier for the soldiers to do their “duty” – commit murder (genocide) – was the manipulation by the leaders to deflect the individual soldier’s natural empathy for the prisoner and to increase the soldier’s empathy for himself, deflecting the natural trajectory towards the other. The “animal pity” and “instinctive reasons” against killing humans are an incomplete form of empathy, based in a mechanism like emotional contagion. In Emile, Rousseau refers to a pre-reflective sentiment of pity. “I am, so to speak, in him, it is in order not to suffer that I do not want him to suffer. I am more interested in him for love of myself, and the reason for the precept is in nature itself, which inspires in me the desire of my well-being in whatever place I feel my existence” (cited in Birmingham 2006: 42). Himmler was afflicted with what Martin L. Hoffman (2000) describes as “empathic distress.”

Without being able to engage further in the infinite sorrow and commentary invoked by the Holocaust, the relevance to empathy is direct. The issue is whether empathy can be used for harm as well as good. In invading Poland and the Netherlands in 1939 and 1940, the Nazis attached sirens to the Stuka dive bombers creating an uncanny noise that seemed to get inside the heads and hearts of the civilian population causing empathic distress. Although it may sound strange to say it, especially after reading Slote, this was based on the Nazi empathy with the victims. On the Anglo-American side, Slote’s reply is that this is not “fully developed empathic concern”. Indeed it is not.

One might try to turn such an example in the direction of an ethics of caring based on empathy by saying in effect, “Look at how fundamental empathy is.” This is accurate. However, what is missing from such a turning is use of empathy separately from its ethically informed application.

The maneuver of the Nazi (or individual psychopathic criminal) of “getting inside someone’s head” is different than being distressed by what distresses him. At the very least, the latter requires a communicability of affect or emotional contagion. Nazis and psychopaths are believed to be able to “get into your head,” but arguably they are noticeably lacking in empathy. They are also thought to lack a conscience (or at least a properly developed one), so an appeal to the example of the psychopath may not be decisive. The variables of missing empathy and missing conscience inevitably confound one another.

Such examples as psychopaths and Nazis allegedly using empathy point in the direction of multiple empathic phenomena such as emotional contagion, gut reactions, and primal pity, that are not empathy pure-and-simple but rely on the same somatic and semantic functions. The distinction between the psychopath or Nazi “getting inside one’s head” and being empathic is a fine one. Like other “diseases” of empathy such as autism, the behavior and motivations lie along a continuum between extremes. At one extreme, empathy is conspicuous by its absence. At the other extreme, low level empathic functioning is in evidence as emotional contagion along with and aspects of pathological (or criminal) behavior in a high functioning, educated individual, who also enjoys aspects of normal empathy.

The anti-foundationalist argument asserts that empathy – whether fully developed or not – does not supply its own ethical application. Empathy does not supply its own ethical justification. Empathy does indeed supply the otherness of the other – simply stated, the other. It is a separate step to care for the other, say, altruistically, or not care for the other. The empathy provides me access to the suffering of the other. It is a further step to take action to reduce that suffering in line with one’s conscience and other ethical conditions and qualifications.

Thus, the supposedly empathic Nazi spends the day shooting the helpless enemies of the Aryan race and feels a full measure of suffering (of the victims), because his mirror neurons are working normally; but instead of saying “Look how they suffer” says “Look how hard my work is – look how much I suffer.” The fall back position for the Anglo-American philosopher such as Slote is to argue that “full, adult human empathy” requires an education (along the lines of Hoffman’s inductive discipline) that leads one to experience strongly with the distress of others. Such an induction of the other’s distress with one’s own results in an inhibition of deliberate harm to the other. But wait. We already have that. It’s not induction of empathy that is needed. This hypothetical Nazis is already suffering, but continues to shoot due to a defective, misguided sense of duty to the Fuhrer. He needs instruction in ethics: Killing is wrong, regardless of what the Fuhrer says. As noted above, this example is discussed by Hannah Arendt in the context of Himmler’s animal pity for his men – under one interpretation (not necessarily Arendt’s) how he provided leadership as an “empathic” Nazi (Arendt 1971a: 105-6). The counter-counter-argument is direct. It is not empathy that inhibits one’s performing harm but rather an ethical prohibition against doing so, regardless of whether one enjoys inflicting pain or not, that stops the hurtful action. In that sense, empathy doesn’t care – it tells you how the other feels – whereas ethics tells one what one ought to do about it. In the final analysis the Nazis or psychopath exemplifies a pathological, distorted, immoral use of empathy. It is a part of the possibility of empathy to be so used and abused, though human beings with integrity and character will undertake the positive development of empathy so that the misuse does not occur or is made less likely. Of course, this has the distressing implication that we are perhaps not as different from the average, everyday Nazi in regard to our empathic capacities as we might want to imagine.

c. Ethics Against Empathy in Levinas

The third contributor in the Continental tradition is Emmanuel Levinas. The paradox of Levinas and his contribution is that someone who makes a substantial contribution to engaging the Other (as with a capital “O”) still has so little to say about empathy, fellow feeling, or sympathy. In fact, nothing. Arguably, Levinas is the anti-empath; yet much of what he says can be marshaled and read as a contribution to the conversation about empathy. For Levinas, the other is radically different. This does not just “raise the bar” on empathy and make it hard; it makes it impossible.

Still, input to a process of empathy is in evidence. For Levinas, access to the other and the infinite depth of the other’s alterity is given through the other’s face. The face is a hot spot announcing the epiphany, the arrival in force, of the other. The infinity that is available in the face is the source of the ethical power of the other in making an unconditional demand on the individual to be regarded and treated ethically as under an obligation without limitation or qualification. Receptivity to the other occurs in the embodiment of the other’s transcendence in the face. The face plays a central role in announcing the other. The other, in turn, commands responsibility. The obligation and ethical demands that the other imposes on the individual are apparent to merest inspection in the face of another human being. “The epiphany of the face is ethical” (Levinas 1961: 199). The hunger, destitution, and suffering expressed in the face of the other shows up as a demand without further comment being permitted. The face puts a stop to my egoism, my enjoyment of the world as if the world were my oyster and only mine. In this context, the word “empathy” does not occur. Yet it is implicitly able to be conceptualized en passant as “the reduction of the other to the same by interposition of a middle and neutral term” such as “cognition of [transient] identity” (1961: 43). In contrast, “we name this calling into question of my spontaneity by the presence of the other ethics” (1961: 43).

To give meaning to one’s presence is an event irreducible to evidence. It does not enter into intuition; it is a presence more direct than visible manifestation, and at the same time a remote presence – that of the other …. The eyes break through the mask – the language of the eyes, impossible to dissemble. The eye does not shine; it speaks. The alternative of truth and lying, of sincerity and dissimulation, is the prerogative of him who abides in the relation of absolute frankness, in the absolute frankness which cannot hide itself (1961: 66).

From this perspective, it is ethics against empathy. The key term here is “absolute”. The other, the face – in this passage, the eye(s) – embody the absolute. The absolute points toward and includes the infinity that is constantly in play in Totality and Infinity. In contrast, empathy totalizes the self and the other in providing evidence as a trace affect of how the self and the other are similar or even transiently identified; whereas ethics requires the other as a radically other, infinitely other, ethical demand. Yet the reader cannot help but suspect that there is an enlarged sense of empathy beyond the specific intentionality of apprehending in evidence what another feels because I feel it too. Empathy provides evidence of the other in that I know what you feel, because I feel it too, at least as a trace affect. The face is also a “hot spot” of empathic clues and receptivity. Yet, for Levinas, evidence of the other would be the ethically irrelevant, toy problem of other minds in (merely) academic philosophy. In empathy, the self and other form (or would form) a totality; but the ipseity (the self) of the I and the other go beyond totality into the infinity of absolute separation and difference in which the self and other are infinitely incommensurable. From this perspective, empathy is a regression to intentional phenomenology, a regression to Heideggerian care, a regression to inauthenticity. An attempt to reconcile the tension between empathy and the other in Levinas argues that empathy, even as a method of gathering evidence, contains at its core an irreducible respect for the other and the other’s demand that, independent of approval or disapproval, recognizes the other’s infinite authority to block my arbitrary actions towards her or him.

The one is about to lie to the other or kill the other over some trivial (or grand) matter, but is stopped up short by the recognition that one would be killing a type (though not a token) of oneself. The contingent matter of fact of nature is then institutionalized, codified, and canonized into an obligation. “Thou shalt not kill, lie, steal” and so on. The obligation is now established. However, the step from a “stopped up short” to an obligatory “Thou shalt not. . . ” is contingent and problematic. As long as the affects (and so on) disclosed through empathy are such as to support the demand of the other and of one’s obligation to the other, then we are on firm ground. However, when the demand fails or is manipulated by advertising, social pressure, or propaganda to disqualify the other and reduce the other into an subhuman entity prior to extra-judicial execution, then the lack of an ethical (moral) criterion independent of affects is sorely missed. It is necessary to transform one’s empathic distress, experiencing the suffering of the other vicariously, into a sympathetic distress that engages the aspect of feeling sorry for the other, resulting in pro-social intervention to assist the other (Hoffman 2000: 87-8). No man (individual) is an island, and narrow self-interest is readily subordinated to the imperative to reduce suffering in the world includes both the self and other on the list of agents without necessarily giving one or the other priority.

5. Empathy in the Context of Psychoanalysis and Ethics

The psychoanalyst Heinz Kohut defines empathy as the primary method of data gathering about other human beings in the discipline of psychoanalysis. Thus, Kohut writes: “Empathy does indeed in essence define the field of our observations” (1977: 306). He offers the resonant image of empathy being the oxygen within which the developing child lives, breathes, and grows up to be a healthy human being, and, in turn, in which the adult flourishes in his or her relationships in love and work. Tactically, empathy is a method of data gathering about what is going on with the other person, and without empathy one’s appreciation of the other is incomplete. Strategically, the empathy of the other person is that which humanizes the individual, and when one individual loses the other, the individual is left apathetic, lethargic, feeling lifeless, depressed. Empathy is the oxygen breathing life into the relationship between individual and other, a metaphor introduced by Heinz Kohut (1977) without, however, Kohut extending it to the ethical dimension. In the contemporary Continental tradition, such an extension of empathy is left to Larry Hatab and John Riker, who note that empathy is a primal existential condition that makes ethical life possible (Hatab 2000; Riker 2010). Such an approach, for example, limits that of Slote, Hume, and Smith, whose use of empathy (sympathy) does indeed overlap extensively with fellow feeling in the sense of the communicability of affect yet also is extended to encompass an essential aspect of approbation or disapprobation (and the primary “warmth” (Slote 2010)) of the other’s heartfelt attitude and sentiment.

Empathy is foundational for psychoanalysis, or, more precisely, Kohut’s version of psychoanalysis that has also come to be called “self psychology”. With insufficient, misdirected, or distorted empathy, the growing, developing person (child) is incomplete. In severe cases of lack of empathy the result is hospitalism (Spitz 1946), profound emotional detachment and lack of connectivity similar to infantile autism. In cases of less severe but still traumatic failures of empathy in parent-child relatedness, the results are defects of the self, similar to but not reducible to character disorders, displaying features of narcissistic grandiosity or the seemingly compulsive pursuit of materialistic ideals of status, stuff, and the conventional success of the inauthentic mass man. The social malaise spreads, displaying ethical failings from road rage to children demanding the latest stuff to school yard bullying, precipitating suicide. Getting something for nothing, inner emptiness, immature grandiosity, and fragile self-esteem are characteristic of disorders of the self, resulting from defective and incomplete empathy (Riker 2010: 15-18). Lack of self-regulation is expressed as the numbers of people who are overweight reaches epidemic proportions, psychiatric sedatives and mood stabilizers (that is, drugs) are a growth industry in avoiding ethical responsibility and the (imperfect) duties of developing one’s talents. Addictions and chronic over-indulgence in alcohol, gambling, sex, recreational (illegal) drugs, and rampant cheating on everything from school testing to income tax to faithlessness to one’s spouse express an unhealthy sense of entitlement. Individuals strive to bandage over the pervasive feelings of inner emptiness and feelings of being a fake in spite of the external trappings of material success. The resulting image is a Nietzschian one – everywhere fragments of persons and no where a complete, whole human being, capable of engaging life with integrity (wholeness). The antidote is empathy. Empathy functions as an on-going process of distinguishing, sustaining, and strengthening the structure of the self.

Paradoxically, the structure of the self is distinguished, sustained, and maintained through failures of empathy, but failures in a phase appropriate, non-traumatic context that enable growth and development going forward. In itself, empathy provides symptom relief to emotional upset and behavioral acting out with drugs or sex, which, as symptom relief, does not last over the long run. Empathy comes into its own when, in an on-going empathic relationship, empathy breaks down and fails in a phase-appropriate, non-traumatic way. These non-traumatic failures of empathy occur within a context of successful empathy that lays down and builds psychic structure in the self. This structure enables the individual to deal with the slings and arrows of outrageous fortune, as setbacks, breakdowns, defeats as well as accomplishments inevitably arise in the course of life. Empathy becomes the foundation of an ethics of excellence through its contribution to the development of the self.

Empathy heals the self, and a well-integrated self is one able to sustain the commitments required to keep one’s word, avoid cheating and self medication with alcohol and recreational drugs, productively engage in satisfying activities and relatedness to others, and contribute to the community.

Empathy is a form of receptivity to the other; it is also a form of understanding. In the latter case, one puts oneself in the place of the other conceptually. In the former, one is open experientially to the affects, sensations, emotions that the other experiences. Undertaking an ethical inquiry without empathy – sensitivity to what is happening to and with the other – would be like engaging in an epistemological inquiry without drawing on the resources of perception. Thus, empathy is a method of access as well as a foundational structure as such.

6. A Common Root of Empathy and Ethics

In the final analysis, morality is separate from empathy and neither necessarily grounds the other, although arguably both point to a common root in human beings as the source of possibility. It will not be practical to argue here at this late point whether humans are intrinsically good or evil. Human beings are intrinsically human. Here “human” means intrinsic possibility. Human possibilities include both good and evil as well as empathy. The evidence provided by the history of the 20^th century is not encouraging, yet it is not too late to turn it around as regards the present and future of humanity. Humans are also capable of great good works as demonstrated in the agricultural revolution of high yield grains that ended hunger for decades, medical “miracles” such as the eradication of small pox and other diseases, which saved many, many millions of lives. No doubt, cynics will find a flaw in every accomplishment and assure that no good deed goes unpunished. Indeed the consequence of our actions often escape us; and the propagation of forgiveness is an innovation and recommendation well counseled (Arendt 1926/65, 1971; Tutu 1999). Likewise, it is a part of the possibility of empathy to be so used and abused, although humans with integrity and character will undertake the positive development of full, adult empathy so that the misuse does not occur or is made less likely.

7. References and Further Reading

Lou Agosta. (1984). “Empathy and intersubjectivity,” Empathy I, ed. J. Lichtenberg et al. Hillsdale, NJ: Lawrence Erlbaum Press.
- Engages the implicit transcendental argument that empathy is the foundation of intersubjectivity (community).
Lou Agosta. (2010). Empathy in the Context of Philosophy. London: Palgrave. Lou Agosta. (2010). Empathy in the Context of Philosophy. London: Palgrave.
- A hermeneutic account of empathy, extending it by means of Heidegger (hermeneutics), Husserl (phenomenology), Searle (language analysis), and Kohut (self psychology).
Aristotle, “On dreams,” Loeb Classical Library: Aristotle VIII: On the Soul, Parva Naturalia, On Breath, tr. W.S. Hett. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1936.
- The first reference to ‘empathesteros’ in the tradition.
Hannah Arendt. (1926/65). Love and Saint Augustine. University of Chicago Press, 1996.
Hannah Arendt. (1971). Eichmann in Jerusalem. New York: Viking Press.
- Input to the debate whether Himmler’s (Nazi) “animal pity” rises to the level of empathy and if so, so what?
John L. Austin. (1946). “Other Minds,” Classics in Analytic Philosophy, ed. R.R. Ammerman. New York: McGraw-Hill, 1965: 353-78.
- Footnote about a “counter-part feeling” that sounds like the vicarious aspect of empathy.
Bruno Bettelheim. (1974). A Home for the Heart. New York: Bantam Paperback, 1975.
- Many uses of empathy in the context of milieu therapy, informed empathically by Bettelheim’s survival of the Nazi concentration camps.
Simon Baron-Cohen. (1995). Mindblindness: An Essay on Autism and Theory of Mind. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1997.
- Extensive use of “false belief” experiments in zeroing in on diseases of empathy such as autism; empathy (absent) as a form of “mindblindness.”
Michael F. Basch. (1983). “Empathic understanding: a review of the concept and some theoretical considerations,” Journal of the American Psychoanalytic Association, Vol. 31, No. 1: 101-126.
- A foundation for psychoanalysis in affective dynamics (empathy) separate from libido and drives.
Peg Birmingham. (2006) Hannah Arendt and Human Rights: The Predicament of Common Responsibility. Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Kaj Björkqvist. (2007). “Empathy, social intelligence and aggression in adolescent boys and girls,” Empathy in Mental Illness, T. Farrow and P. Woodruff, eds. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press.
- Training (induction) in empathy reduces aggression.
Michael Boylan. (2008). The Good, the True and the Beautiful. New York: Continuum Books.
- Uses sympathy to ground an account of the affective good will.
Ted Cohen. (2008). Thinking of Others: On the Talent for Metaphor. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2008.
- The capacity for metaphor (arguably) underlies the capacity for empathy (that is, thinking of others).
Stephen Darwall. (2006). The Second-Person Standpoint: Morality, Respect and Accountability. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- A linguistic-grammatically informed version of the struggle for recognition (without endorsing Hegel) that you should not hurt me.
Stephen Darwall. (1995) The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’: 1640 – 1740. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
- A monumental study, arguing (among other things) that Hume goes beyond sympathy (and moral sentimentalism) to rule-regulation.
Charles Darwin. (1872). The Expression of the Emotions in Man and Animals. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1965.
- Basic emotions are continuous, arguably due to shared physiological (evolutionary) infrastructure, between man and animals.
Frans de Waal. (2009). The Age of Empathy. New York: Harmony Press.
- Empathy with higher mammals breaks through to the general reading market.
J. Decety and T. Chaminade. (2003). “When the self represents the other: A new cognitive neuroscience view on psychological identification,” Consciousness and Cognition 12 (2003).
- Has a fMRI machine and knows how to use it to study empathy.
J. Decety & P.L. Jackson. (2004). “The functional architecture of human empathy,” Behavioral and Cognitive Neuroscience Reviews, Vol 3, No. 2, June 2004, 71-100.
- One of the most robust definitions of empathy in the literature.
J. Decety & C. Lamm. (2006). “Human empathy through the lens of social neuroscience,” The ScientificWorld Journal 6 (2006), 1146-1163.
- Just as the title says.
M. A. Diego and N. A. Jones. (2007). “Neonatal antecedents for empathy,” Empathy in Mental Illness, T. Farrow and P. Woodruff, eds. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press.
- Without empathy, the infant is damaged emotionally and behaviorally, resulting in autistic- and psychotic-like symptoms.
M. A. Diego and N. A. Jones. (2003). Emotions Revealed: Recognizing Faces and Feelings to Improve Communication and Emotional Life. New York: Henry Holt.
- Same as Ekman below.
Paul Ekman. (1985). Telling Lies: Clues to Deceit in the Marketplace, Politics, and Marriage. New York, W.W. Norton.
- Develops the idea of micro-expressions betraying otherwise hidden affects, which are relevant inputs to further empathic processing (the latter not discussed by Ekman). Should be read along with Hume.
T. Farrow and P. Woodruff, eds. (2007). Empathy in Mental Illness. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press.
- Diseases of (absent) empathy such as autism, psycho-pathy, hospitalism; the neurological infrastructure in mirror neurons, extending to philosophy.
S. Freud. (date unknown). The Standard Edition of Freud’s Works, tr. under the supervision of James Strachey, 24 volumes. London: Hogard Press, 1955-64.
S. Freud. (1909). Jokes and their Relation to the Unconscious, tr. J. Strachey. New York: W. W. Norton, 1960.
- Most of the occurrences of Einfühlung” [empathy] in Freud occur in this work, which explicitly references Lipps, who Freud owned and marked.
Michael N. Forster. (2010). After Herder: Philosophy of Language in the German Tradition. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Herder applies “Einfühlung” [empathy] to understanding difficult texts and interpretations, obtaining clear priority in publication over Lipps and other users of the concept.
Vittorio Gallese. (2007). “The shared manifold hypothesis: Embodied simulation and its role in empathy and social cognition,” Empathy in Mental Illness, eds. Tom Farrow and Peter Woodruff, Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
- Argues for a shared (empathic) manifold based on mirror neurons.
Arnold Goldberg. (1999). Being of two Minds: The Vertical Split in Psychoanalysis and Psychotherapy. Hillsdale, NJ: The Analytic Press.
- Examples of empathy based on immersion in listening to the other.
Pat Greenspan. (1980). “A case of mixed feelings: ambivalence and the logic of emotion,” Explaining Emotions, ed., A. O. Rorty. Berkeley: University of California Press.
- Ambivalent feelings happen, requiring revising our understanding of consistency and rationality.
Ralph R. Greenson. (1960). “Empathy and its vicissitudes,” International Journal of Psychoanalysis 41 (1960): 418-24.
- Empathy as building a model of the other and using it to capture the other.
H. Hartmann. (1959). “Psychoanalysis as a scientific theory.” Psychoanalysis, Scientific Method, and Philosophy: A Symposium, ed. S. Hook. New York: New York University Press, 1964: 3-37.
- This is the philosophy of science being debated at the time that Heinz Kohut was writing his first empathy article (Kohut 1959).
Lawrence J. Hatab. (2000). Ethics and Finitude: Heideggerian Contributions to Moral Philosophy. Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield.
- Contains a chapter on empathy and engages empathy on the critical path of the existential foundation of ethics.
Elaine Hatfield, John T. Cacioppo, Richard L. Rapson . (1994). Emotional Contagion. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
- Emotional contagion is input to affective processing by empathy (the latter not otherwise engaged).
Martin Heidegger. (1927). Sein und Zeit. Tübingen: Max Niemeyer, 1972.
- See below.
Martin Heidegger. (1927). Being and Time, tr. J. Stambaugh. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 1996.
Martin Heidegger. (1927). Being and Time, trs. J. Macquarrie and E. Robinson. New York: Harper and Row, 1962.
- Two references to “a special hermeneutic of empathy [Einfühlung]” as part of engagement (and dismissal) of Scheler and Stein; a significant indirect contribution to empathy.
Johann Gottfried von Herder. (1772/1792). Philosophical Writings, tr. and ed. M. N. Forster. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
- Applies Einfühlung” [empathy] to understanding difficult texts and interpretations, obtaining clear priority in publication over Lipps.
Martin L. Hoffman. (2000). Empathy and Moral Development: Implications for Caring and Justice. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
- Rich engagement with moral issues, distinguishing empathic distress and sympathetic distress.
David Hume. (1739). A Treatise of Human Nature, ed. L. A. Selby-Bigge (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1973).
- Above “SBN” refers to the Selby-Bigge edition and “T” refers to the Chapter, section, and paragraph in the Clarendon edition text. Many meanings of “sympathy” as engaged herein.
David Hume. (1739/1904). Ein Traktat über die menschliche Natur in 2 Bänden, tr. Theodor Lipps. Hamburg: Felix Meiner Verlag, 1904/06.
- The point where Lipps (1903) was enlightened about the relevance of empathy to taste and beauty.
David Hume, “Of the delicacy of taste and passion” (1741) in Of the Standard of Taste and Other Essays, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill: 1965.
- Leaves a logical space for a “delicacy of sympathy” open and undeveloped.
David Hume, “Of the standard of taste” (1757) in Of the Standard of Taste and Other Essays, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill: 1965.
- The standard of taste perceives a micro impression that the ordinary person does not perceive, leaving a logical space open for an undeveloped delicacy of sympathy (that is, delicacy of empathy).
Edmund Husserl. (1929/35). Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjectivität: Texte aus dem Nachlass: Dritter Teil: 1929-1935, ed. I. Kern. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973. Husserliana XV.
- Dozens of references to Einfühlung [empathy] as it migrates from the periphery and superstructure of intersubjectivity to the foundation of community.
M. Iacoboni. (2005). “Understanding others: Imitation, language, and empathy,” Perspectives on Imitation: From Neuroscience to Social Science, S. Hurly and N. Chater, eds. Vol. 1 (76-100). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Seeking a philosophical description of how mirror neurons bind us together in empathy
M. Iacoboni. (2007). “Existential empathy: the intimacy of self and other,” Empathy in Mental Illness, eds. Tom Farrow and Peter Woodruff, Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Philip L. Jackson, Andrew N. Meltzoff, and Jean Decety. (2005). “How do we perceive the pain of others?
- A window into the neural processes involved in empathy,” Neuroimage 24 (2005).
Hans H. Kögler and Karsten R. Stueber, eds. (2000). Empathy and Agency: The Problem of Understanding in the Human Sciences. Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
- Emphasizes Verstehen.
Hans H. Kögler. (2000). “Empathy, dialogical self, and reflexive interpretation: The symbolic source of simulation,” Empathy and Agency: The Problem of Understanding in the Human Sciences, Hans H. Kögler and Karsten R. Stueber, eds. Boulder, CO: Westview Press, 2000.
- As the title says.
Heinz Kohut. (1959). “Introspection, empathy, and psychoanalysis,” The Journal of the American Psychoanalytic Association 7: 459-83.
- Empathy (“vicarious introspection”) as a data gathering method, defining psychoanalysis.
Heinz Kohut. (1966). “Forms and transformations of narcissism.” Journal of the American Psychoanalytic Association 14: 243-272.
- Empathy is related to humor, appreciation of art, and wisdom, enhanced in working through the self (narcissism).
Heinz Kohut. (1971). The Analysis of the Self. New York: International Universities Press.
- Identifies two new forms of transference and empathy in each in the context of the self.
Heinz Kohut. (1977). The Restoration of the Self. New York: International Universities Press.
- Arguably the book that Kohut was trying to write in 1971, exploring the role of empathy as the oxygen in which the well-being of the self flourishes.
Heinz Kohut. (1984). How Does Analysis Cure? eds. A. Goldberg and P. E. Stepansky. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- The short answer is “empathy”; the longer answer is “phase appropriate (non traumatic) failures of empathy that get worked through in therapy.”
Emmanuel Levinas. (1961). Totality and Infinity: An Essay on Exteriority, tr. A. Lingis. Pittsburgh, PA: Dusquesne University Press, 2007.
- Provides empathy against ethics with so much to say about The Other; so little, about empathy, which latter falls on the side of totality, not infinity.
H. G. Liddell and R. Scott. (1940). A Greek-English Lexicon.
- Revised and augmented throughout by Sir Henry Stuart Jones with the assistance of Roderick McKenzie. Oxford. Clarendon Press. 1940.
T. Lipps. (1903). Aesthetik. Hamburg: Leopold Voss, 1903.
- “Einfühlung” [empathy] is engaged as the basis of the experience of beauty.
T. Lipps . (1909). Leitfaden der Psychologie. Leipzig: Wilhelm Engelmann Verlag, 1909.
- “Einfühlung” [empathy] is engaged as the basis of our experience of other minds [fremden Seelen Lebens].
Bonnie E. Litowitz. (2007). “The second person,” Journal of the American Psychoanalytic Association, 57: 1129.
- Distinguishes between the dialogical and dyadic contexts in which empathy flourishes.
Rudolf Makkreel. (1975). Dilthey: Philosopher of the Human Science. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
- Embraces re-experiencing (nacherleben) and Verstehen rather than empathy.
E. Nagel. (1959). “Methodological issues in psychoanalytic theory.” Psychoanalysis, Scientific Method, and Philosophy: A Symposium, ed. S. Hook. New York: New York University Press, 1964: 38-56.
- The philosophy of science being debated at the time that Heinz Kohut was writing his first empathy article (Kohut 1959).
Thomas Nagel. (1970). The Possibility of Altruism. Princeton, NJ: Princeton Paperbacks, 1978.
- Arguably, empathy implements altruism, which is (still) possible.
Thomas Nagel. (1974). “On What It’s Like to Be a bat,” The Mind’s I, eds. D. R. Hofstadter & D. C. Dennett. New York: Bantam Books, 1981.
- Empathy pushed into a footnote.
Friedrich Nietzsche. (1887). On the Genealogy of Morals, tr. W. Kaufmann & R. J. Hollingdale. New York: Vintage/Random House, 1969.
- Uses empathy (but not the word) to inform his sense of smell and suspicion.
Frederick A. Olafson. (1998). Heidegger and the Ground of Ethics: A Study of Mitsein, Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Christine Olden. (1956). “On empathy with children,” The Psychoanalytic Study of the Child 8 (1956: 111-26).
Eric Partridge. (1966). Origins: A Short Etymological Dictionary of Modern English, 4^th Edition. New York: Macmillan, 1977.
Adriaan Peperzak. (1997). Beyond: The Philosophy of Emmanuel Levinas. Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
- An introduction with so much to say about The Other and so little about empathy. The latter falls on the side of totality, not infinity; it is empathy against ethics.
John Rawls. (1971). A Theory of Justice. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Engages “sympathy” as part of his analysis of altruism.
John Riker. (2010). Why It’s Good to be Good. New York: Jason Aronson Press.
- Self psychology (Kohut 1977, 1984), with its focus on empathy and restoring integrity to the self, addresses ethical issues such as rampant cheating, addiction, selfishness, and (unethical) narcissism.
Max Scheler. (1913). Zur Phänomenologie und Theorie der Sympathiegefühle in Scheler’s Späte Schriften in Gesammelte Werke, ed. Maria Scheler and Manfred Frings. Vol. 9, Bern: Francke Verlag 1976.
Max Scheler. (1913/22). The Nature of Sympathy, tr. Peter Heath. Hamden: CN: Archon Books, 1970.
- An insightful analysis of the distinction between vicarious feeling, shared feeling, and projective empathy.
Michael Slote. (2007). The Ethics of Care and Empathy. London: Routledge.
- Empathic caring as a moral criterion and the moral aspects of the ethics of care.
Michael Slote. (2010). Moral Sentimentalism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A rich engagement in which empathy provides an intelligible mechanism for moral approval and disapproval, lending philosophic rigor to the mere metaphor of moral sense (and sentimentalism).
Adam Smith. (1759). The Theory of the Moral Sentiments. Indianapolis: Liberty Classics 1969.
- Sympathy recruits the imagination and fellow feeling to align with a sense of (dis)approbation, defining the limits of the human (ethical) community.
R. A. Spitz. (1946). “Hospitalism: a follow up report.” The Psychoanalytic Study of the Child, 2: 113-117.
- First researcher to document that without empathy (affectionate care taking), institutionalized (hospitalized) infants sustain serious emotional, behavioral damage, simulating autism and psychosis; provided significant input to B. Bettelheim.
Edith Stein. (1917). On the Problem of Empathy, tr. Waltraut Stein. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1970.
- Thoroughly debunks Lipps and (arguably) taught Husserl everything he knew about empathy in Ideas II; yet fails to ‘surface’ a deep analysis of the underlying intentionality of the other in relation to the act of empathy.
Karsten R. Stueber. (2006). Rediscovering Empathy. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Stueber endorses the approach of the philosopher Donald Davidson, and, if the latter had engaged empathy, he might have developed an argument similar to this one.
Edward B. Titchner. (1909). Lectures on the Experimental Psychology of the Thought-Processes. New York: Macmillan.
- First translation into English of “Einfühlung” as “empathy.”
H. Trosman and R. Simmons. (1972). “The Freud Library,” Journal of the American Psychoanalytic Association, 21 (1973): 646-87.
- Tracks the two dozen or so references to “Einfühlung” in Freud.
J.D. Trout.(2009). The Empathy Gap. New York: Viking Press.
- Empathy falls short of reason; and reason falls short of empathy.
Desmond Tutu. (1999). No Future Without Forgiveness. New York: Doubleday.
Lauren Wispé. (1987). “History of the concept of empathy,” Empathy and its Development, N. Eisenberg & J. Strayer, eds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- A collection of quotations.
Lauren Wispé. (1991). The Psychology of Sympathy. New York: Plenum Press.
- A collection of quotations; we now know who said what and when they said it.
Dan Zahavi. (2005). Subjectivity and Selfhood: Investigating the First-Person Perspective. Cambridge, UK: Bradfordbook/MIT Press.
- Lively engagement with empathy, narrative, Heidegger, Husserl, Ricoeur, and Sartre.

Author Information

Lou Agosta
Email: LAgosta@UChicago.edu
University of Chicago
U. S. A.

Care Ethics

The moral theory known as “ the ethics of care” implies that there is moral significance in the fundamental elements of relationships and dependencies in human life. Normatively, care ethics seeks to maintain relationships by contextualizing and promoting the well-being of care-givers and care-receivers in a network of social relations. Most often defined as a practice or virtue rather than a theory as such, “care” involves maintaining the world of, and meeting the needs of, ourself and others. It builds on the motivation to care for those who are dependent and vulnerable, and it is inspired by both memories of being cared for and the idealizations of self. Following in the sentimentalist tradition of moral theory, care ethics affirms the importance of caring motivation, emotion and the body in moral deliberation, as well as reasoning from particulars. One of the original works of care ethics was Milton Mayeroff’s short book, On Caring, but the emergence of care ethics as a distinct moral theory is most often attributed to the works of psychologist Carol Gilligan and philosopher Nel Noddings in the mid-1980s. Both charged traditional moral approaches with male bias, and asserted the “voice of care” as a legitimate alternative to the “justice perspective” of liberal human rights theory. Annette Baier, Virginia Held, Eva Feder Kittay, Sara Ruddick, and Joan Tronto are some of the most influential among many subsequent contributors to care ethics.

Typically contrasted with deontological/Kantian and consequentialist/utilitarian ethics, care ethics is found to have affinities with moral perspectives such as African ethics, Confucian ethics, and others. Critics fault care ethics with being a kind of slave morality, and as having serious shortcomings including essentialism, parochialism, and ambiguity. Although care ethics is not synonymous with feminist ethics, much has been written about care ethics as a feminine and feminist ethic, in relation to motherhood, international relations, and political theory. Care ethics is widely applied to a number of moral issues and ethical fields, including caring for animals and the environment, bioethics, and more recently public policy. Originally conceived as most appropriate to the private and intimate spheres of life, care ethics has branched out as a political theory and social movement aimed at broader understanding of, and public support for, care-giving activities in their breadth and variety.

History and Major Authors
Definitions of Care
Criticisms
Feminine and Feminist Ethics
Relation to Other Theories
Maternalism
International Relations
Political Theory
Caring for Animals
Applied Care Ethics
Care Movements
References and Further Reading

1. History and Major Authors

a. Carol Gilligan

While early strains of care ethics can be detected in the writings of feminist philosophers such as Mary Wollstonecraft, Catherine and Harriet Beecher, and Charlotte Perkins, it was first most explicitly articulated by Carol Gilligan and Nel Noddings in the early 1980s. While a graduate student at Harvard, Gilligan wrote her dissertation outlining a different path of moral development than the one described by Lawrence Kohlberg, her mentor. Kohlberg had posited that moral development progressively moves toward more universalized and principled thinking and had also found that girls, when later included in his studies, scored significantly lower than boys. Gilligan faulted Kohlberg’s model of moral development for being gender biased, and reported hearing a “different voice” than the voice of justice presumed in Kohlberg’s model. She found that both men and women articulated the voice of care at different times, but noted that the voice of care, without women, would nearly fall out of their studies. Refuting the charge that the moral reasoning of girls and women is immature because of its preoccupation with immediate relations, Gilligan asserted that the “care perspective” was an alternative, but equally legitimate form of moral reasoning obscured by masculine liberal justice traditions focused on autonomy and independence. She characterized this difference as one of theme, however, rather than of gender.

Gilligan articulated these thematic perspectives through the moral reasoning of “Jake” and “Amy”, two children in Kohlberg’s studies responding to the “Heinz dilemma”. In this dilemma, the children are asked whether a man, “Heinz”, should have stolen an overpriced drug to save the life of his ill wife. Jake sees the Heinz dilemma as a math problem with people wherein the right to life trumps the right to property, such that all people would reasonably judge that Heinz ought to steal the drug. Amy, on the other hand, disagrees that Heinz should steal the drug, lest he should go to prison and leave his wife in another predicament. She sees the dilemma as a narrative of relations over time, involving fractured relationships that must be mended through communication. Understanding the world as populated with networks of relationships rather than people standing alone, Amy is confident that the druggist would be willing to work with Heinz once the situation was explained. Gilligan posited that men and women often speak different languages that they think are the same, and she sought to correct the tendency to take the male perspective as the prototype for humanity in moral reasoning.

Later, Gilligan vigorously resisted readings of her work that posit care ethics as relating to gender more than theme, and even established the harmony of care and justice ethics (1986), but she never fully abandoned her thesis of an association between women and relational ethics. She further developed the idea of two distinct moral “voices”, and their relationship to gender in Mapping the Moral Domain: A Contribution of Women’s Thinking to Psychological Theory and Education (Gilligan, Ward, and Taylor, 1988), a collection of essays that traced the predominance of the “justice perspective” within the fields of psychology and education, and the implications of the excluded “care perspective”. In Making Connections: The Relational Worlds of Adolescent Girls at Emma Willard School, Gilligan and her co-editors argued that the time between the ages of eleven and sixteen is crucial to girls’ formation of identity, being the time when girls learn to silence their inner moral intuitions in favor of more rule bound interpretations of moral reasoning (Gilligan, Lyons, and Hamner, 1990, 3). Gilligan found that in adulthood women are encouraged to resolve the crises of adolescence by excluding themselves or others, that is, by being good/responsive, or by being selfish/independent. As a result, women’s adolescent voices of resistance become silent, and they experience a dislocation of self, mind, and body, which may be reflected in eating disorders, low leadership aspiration, and self-effacing sexual choices. Gilligan also expanded her ideas in a number of articles and reports (Gilligan, 1979; 1980; 1982; 1987).

b. Nel Noddings

In 1984 Noddings published Caring, in which she developed the idea of care as a feminine ethic, and applied it to the practice of moral education. Starting from the presumption that women “enter the practical domain of moral action…through a different door”, she ascribed to feminine ethics a preference for face-to face moral deliberation that occurs in real time, and appreciation of the uniqueness of each caring relationship. Drawing conceptually from a maternal perspective, Noddings understood caring relationships to be basic to human existence and consciousness. She identified two parties in a caring relationship—“one-caring” and the “cared-for”—and affirmed that both parties have some form of obligation to care reciprocally and meet the other morally, although not in the same manner. She characterized caring as an act of “engrossment” whereby the one-caring receives the cared-for on their own terms, resisting projection of the self onto the cared-for, and displacing selfish motives in order to act on the behalf of the cared-for. Noddings located the origin of ethical action in two motives, the human affective response that is a natural caring sentiment, and the memory of being cared-for that gives rise to an ideal self. Noddings rejected universal principles for prescribed action and judgment, arguing that care must always be contextually applied.

Noddings identified two stages of caring, “caring-for” and “caring-about”. The former stage refers to actual hands-on application of caring services, and the latter to a state of being whereby one nurtures caring ideas or intentions. She further argued that the scope of caring obligation is limited. This scope of caring is strongest towards others who are capable of reciprocal relationship. The caring obligation is conceived of as moving outward in concentric circles so enlarged care is increasingly characterized by a diminished ability for particularity and contextual judgment, which prompted Noddings to speculate that it is impossible to care-for everyone. She maintained that while the one-caring has an obligation to care-for proximate humans and animals to the extent that they are needy and able to respond to offerings of care, there is a lesser obligation to care for distant others if there is no hope that care will be completed. These claims proved to be highly controversial, and Noddings later revised them somewhat. In her more recent book Starting From Home, Noddings endorsed a stronger obligation to care about distant humans, and affirms caring-about as an important motivational stage for inspiring local and global justice, but continued to hold that it is impossible to care-for all, especially distant others. (See 3a.iv below)

c. Other Influential authors

Although many philosophers have developed care ethics, five authors are especially notable.

i. Annette Baier

Annette Baier observes certain affinities between care ethics and the moral theory of David Hume, whom she dubs the “women’s moral theorist.” Baier suggests both deny that morality consists in obedience to a universal law, emphasizing rather the importance of cultivating virtuous sentimental character traits, including gentleness, agreeability, compassion, sympathy, and good temperedness (1987, 42). Baier specially underscores trust, a basic relation between particular persons, as the fundamental concept of morality, and notes its obfuscation within theories premised on abstract and autonomous agents. She recommends carving out room for the development of moral emotions and harmonizing the ideals of care and justice.

ii. Virginia Held

Virginia Held is the editor and author of many books pertaining to care ethics. In much of her work she seeks to move beyond ideals of liberal justice, arguing that they are not as much flawed as limited, and examines how social relations might be different when modeled after mothering persons and children. Premised on a fundamental non-contractual human need for care, Held construes care as the most basic moral value. In Feminist Morality (1993), Held explores the transformative power of creating new kinds of social persons, and the potentially distinct culture and politics of a society that sees as “its most important task the flourishing of children and the creation of human relationships”. She describes feminist ethics as committed to actual experience, with an emphasis on reason and emotion, literal rather than hypothetical persons, embodiment, actual dialogue, and contextual, lived methodologies. In The Ethics of Care (2006), Held demonstrates the relevance of care ethics to political, social and global questions. Conceptualizing care as a cluster of practices and values, she describes a caring person as one who has appropriate motivations to care for others and who participates adeptly in effective caring practices. She argues for limiting both market provisions for care and the need for legalistic thinking in ethics, asserting that care ethics has superior resources for dealing with the power and violence that imbues all relations, including those on the global level. Specifically, she recommends a view of a globally interdependent civil society increasingly dependent upon an array of caring NGOs for solving problems. She notes: “The small societies of family and friendship embedded in larger societies are formed by caring relations… A globalization of caring relations would help enable people of different states and cultures to live in peace, to respect each others’ rights, to care together for their environments, and to improve the lives of their children”(168). Ultimately, she argues that rights based moral theories presume a background of social connection, and that when fore-grounded, care ethics can help to create communities that promote healthy social relations, rather than the near boundless pursuit of self-interest.

iii. Eva Feder Kittay

Eva Feder Kittay is another prominent care ethicist. Her book, Women and Moral Theory (1987), co-edited with Diana T. Meyers, is one the most significant anthologies in care ethics to date. In this work they map conceptual territory inspired by Gilligan’s work, both critically and supportively, by exploring major philosophical themes such as self and autonomy, ethical principles and universality, feminist moral theory, and women and politics. In Love’s Labor (1999), Kittay develops a dependency based account of equality rooted in the activity of caring for the seriously disabled. Kittay holds that the principles in egalitarian theories of justice, such as those of John Rawls, depend upon more fundamental principles and practices of care, and that without supplementation such theories undermine themselves (108). Kittay observes that in practice some women have been able to leave behind traditional care-giving roles only because other women have filled them, but she resists the essentialist association between women and care by speaking of “dependency workers” and “dependency relations”. She argues that equality for dependency workers and the unavoidably dependent will only be achieved through conceptual and institutional reform. Employing expanded ideals of fairness and reciprocity that take interdependence as basic, Kittay poses a third principle for Rawls’ theory of justice: “To each according to his or her need, from each to his or her capacity for care, and such support from social institutions as to make available resources and opportunities to those providing care” (113). She more precisely calls for the public provision of Doulas, paid professional care-workers who care for care-givers, and uses the principle of Doula to justify welfare for all care-givers, akin to worker’s compensation or unemployment benefits.

iv. Sara Ruddick

Held identifies Sara Ruddick as the original pioneer of the theory of care ethics, citing Ruddick’s 1980 article “Maternal Thinking” as the first articulation of a distinctly feminine approach to ethics. In this article, and in her later book of the same title (1989), Ruddick uses care ethical methodology to theorize from the lived experience of mothering, rendering a unique approach to moral reasoning and a ground for a feminist politics of peace. Ruddick explains how the practices of “maternal persons” (who may be men or women), exhibit cognitive capacities or conceptions of virtue with larger moral relevance. Ruddick’s analysis, which forges strong associations between care ethics and motherhood, has been both well-received and controversial (see Section 6, below).

v. Joan Tronto

Joan Tronto is most known for exploring the intersections of care ethics, feminist theory, and political science. She sanctions a feminist care ethic designed to thwart the accretion of power to the existing powerful, and to increase value for activities that legitimize shared power. She identifies moral boundaries that have served to privatize the implications of care ethics, and highlights the political dynamics of care relations which describe, for example, the tendency of women and other minorities to perform care work in ways that benefit the social elite. She expands the phases of care to include “caring about”, “taking care of” (assuming responsibility for care), “care-giving” (the direct meeting of need), and “care-receiving”. She coins the phrase “privileged irresponsibility” to describe the phenomenon that allows the most advantaged in society to purchase caring services, delegate the work of care-giving, and avoid responsibility for the adequacy of hands-on care. (See Sections 2 and 8 below).

2. Definitions of Care

Because it depends upon contextual considerations, care is notoriously difficult to define. As Ruddick points out, at least three distinct but overlapping meanings of care have emerged in recent decades—an ethic defined in opposition to justice, a kind of labor, and a particular relationship (1998, 4). However, in care ethical literature, ‘care’ is most often defined as a practice, value, disposition, or virtue, and is frequently portrayed as an overlapping set of concepts. For example, Held notes that care is a form of labor, but also an ideal that guides normative judgment and action, and she characterizes care as “clusters” of practices and values (2006, 36, 40). One of the most popular definitions of care, offered by Tronto and Bernice Fischer, construes care as “a species of activity that includes everything we do to maintain, contain, and repair our ‘world’ so that we can live in it as well as possible. That world includes our bodies, ourselves, and our environment”. This definition posits care fundamentally as a practice, but Tronto further identifies four sub-elements of care that can be understood simultaneously as stages, virtuous dispositions, or goals. These sub-elements are: (1) attentiveness, a proclivity to become aware of need; (2) responsibility, a willingness to respond and take care of need; (3) competence, the skill of providing good and successful care; and (4) responsiveness, consideration of the position of others as they see it and recognition of the potential for abuse in care (1994, 126-136). Tronto’s definition is praised for how it admits to cultural variation and extends care beyond family and domestic spheres, but it is also criticized for being overly broad, counting nearly every human activity as care.

Other definitions of care provide more precise delineations. Diemut Bubeck narrows the definitional scope of care by emphasizing personal interaction and dependency. She describes care as an emotional state, activity, or both, that is functional, and specifically involves “the meeting of needs of one person by another where face-to-face interaction between care and cared for is a crucial element of overall activity, and where the need is of such a nature that it cannot possibly be met by the person in need herself” (129). Bubeck thus distinguishes care from “service”, by stipulating that “care” involves meeting the needs for others who cannot meet their needs themselves, whereas “service” involves meeting the needs of individuals who are capable of self-care. She also holds that one cannot care for oneself, and that care does not require any emotional attachment. While some care ethicists accept that care need not always have an emotional component, Bubeck’s definitional exclusion of self-care is rejected by other care ethicists who stress additional aspects of care.

For example, both Maurice Hamington and Daniel Engster make room for self-care in their definitions of care, but focus more precisely on special bodily features and end goals of care (Hamington, 2004; Engster, 2007). Hamington focuses on embodiment, stating that: “care denotes an approach to personal and social morality that shifts ethical considerations to context, relationships, and affective knowledge in a manner that can only be fully understood if care’s embodied dimension is recognized. Care is committed to flourishing and growth of individuals, yet acknowledges our interconnectedness and interdependence” (2004, 3). Engster develops a “basic needs” approach to care, defining care as a practice that includes “everything we do to help individuals to meet their vital biological needs, develop or maintain their basic capabilities, and avoid or alleviate unnecessary or unwanted pain and suffering, so that they can survive, develop, and function in society” (2007, 28). Although care is often unpaid, interpersonal, and emotional work, Engster’s definition does not exclude paid work or self-care, nor require the presence of affection or other emotion (32). Although these definitions emphasize care as a practice, not all moral theorists maintain this view of.

Alternatively, care is understood as a virtue or motive. James Rachels, Raja Halwani, and Margaret McLaren have argued for categorizing care ethics as a species of virtue ethics, with care as a central virtue (Rachels, 1999; McLaren, 2001; Halwani, 2003). The idea that that care is best understood as virtuous motives or communicative skills is endorsed by Michael Slote who equates care with a kind of motivational attitude of empathy, and by Selma Sevenhuijsen, who defines care as “styles of situated moral reasoning” that involves listening and responding to others on their own terms.” (Slote, 2007; Sevenhuijsen, 1998, 85).

Some ethicists prefer to understand care as a practice more fundamental than a virtue or motive because doing so resists the tendency to romanticize care as a sentiment or dispositional trait, and reveals the breadth of caring activities as globally intertwined with virtually all aspects of life. As feminist ethicists, Kittay and Held like to understand care as a practice and value rather than as a virtue because it risks “losing site of it as work” (Held, 2006, 35). Held refutes that care is best understood as a disposition such as compassion or benevolence, but defines “care” as “more a characterization of a social relation than the description of an individual disposition.”

Overall, care continues to be an essentially contested concept, containing ambiguities that Peta Bowden, finds advantageous, revealing “the complexity and diversity of the ethical possibilities of care”(1997, 183).

3. Criticisms

A number of criticisms have been launched against care ethics, including that it is: a) a slave morality; b) empirically flawed; c) theoretically indistinct; d) parochial, e) essentialist, and f) ambiguous.

a. Care Ethics as a Slave Morality

One of the earliest objections was that care ethics is a kind of slave morality valorizing the oppression of women (Puka, 1990; Card, 1990; Davion, 1993). The concept of slave morality comes from the philosopher Frederick Nietzsche, who held that oppressed peoples tend to develop moral theories that reaffirm subservient traits as virtues. Following this tradition, the charge that care ethics is a slave morality interprets the different voice of care as emerging from patriarchal traditions characterized by rigidly enforced sexual divisions of labor. This critique issues caution against uncritically valorizing caring practices and inclinations because women who predominantly perform the work of care often do so to their own economic and political disadvantage. To the extent that care ethics encourages care without further inquiring as to who is caring for whom, and whether these relationships are just, it provides an unsatisfactory base for a fully libratory ethic. This objection further implies that the voice of care may not be an authentic or empowering expression, but a product of false consciousness that equates moral maturity with self-sacrifice and self-effacement.

b. Care Ethics as Empirically Flawed

Critics also question the empirical accuracy and validity of Gilligan’s studies. Gilligan has been faulted for basing her conclusions on too narrow a sample, and for drawing from overly homogenous groups such as students at elite colleges and women considering abortion (thereby excluding women who would not view abortion as morally permissible). It is argued that wider samples yield more diverse results and complicate the picture of dual and gendered moral perspectives (Haan, 1976; Brabeck, 1983). For instance, Vanessa Siddle Walker and John Snarey surmise that resolution of the Heinz dilemma shifts if Heinz is identified as Black, because in the United States African-American males are disproportionately likely to be arrested for crime, and less likely to have their cases dismissed without stringent penalties (Walker and Snarey, 2004). Sandra Harding observes certain similarities between care ethics and African moralities, noting that care ethics has affinities with many other moral traditions (Harding, 1987). Sarah Lucia Hoagland identifies care as the heart of lesbian connection, but also cautions against the dangers of assuming that all care relations are ideally maternalistic (Hoagland, 1988). Thus, even if some women identify with care ethics, it is unclear whether this is a general quality of women, whether moral development is distinctly and dualistically gendered, and whether the voice of care is the only alternative moral voice. However, authors like Marilyn Friedman maintain that even if it cannot be shown that care is a distinctly female moral orientation, it is plausibly understood as a symbolically feminine approach (Friedman, 1987).

c. Care Ethics as Theoretically Indistinct

Along similar lines some critics object that care ethics is not a highly distinct moral theory, and that it rightly incorporates liberal concepts such as autonomy, equality, and justice. Some defenders of utilitarianism and deontology argue that the concerns highlighted by care ethics have been, or could be, readily addressed by existing theories (Nagl-Docekal, 1997; Ma, 2002). Others suggest that care ethics merely reduces to virtue ethics with care being one of many virtues (Rachels, 1999; Slote, 1998a; 1998b; McLaren, 2001, Halwani, 2003). Although a number of care ethicists explore the possible overlap between care ethics and other moral theories, the distinctiveness of the ethic is defended by some current advocates of care ethics, who contend that the focus on social power, identity, relationship, and interdependency are unique aspects of the theory (Sander-Staudt, 2006). Most care ethicists make room for justice concerns and for critically scrutinizing alternatives amongst justice perspectives. In some cases, care ethicists understand the perspectives of care and justice as mutual supplements to one another. Other theorists underscore the strategic potential for construing care as a right in liberal societies that place a high rhetorical value on human rights. Yet others explore the benefits of integrating care ethics with less liberal traditions of justice, such as Marxism (Bubeck, 1995).

d. Care Ethics as Parochial

Another set of criticisms center around the concern that care ethics obscures larger social dynamics and is overly parochial. These critiques aim at Noddings’ original assertion that care givers have primary obligations to proximate others over distant others (Tronto, 1995, 111-112; Robinson, 1999, 31). Critics worry that this stance privileges elite care-givers by excusing them from attending to significant differences in international standards of living and their causes. Critics also express a concern that without a broader sense of justice, care ethics may allow for cronyism and favoritism toward one’s family and friends (Friedman, 2006; Tronto, 2006). Noddings now affirms an explicit theme of justice in care ethics that resists arbitrary favoritism, and that extends to public and international domains. Yet she upholds the primacy of the domestic sphere as the originator and nurturer of justice, in the sense that the best social policies are identified, modeled, and sustained by practices in the “best families”. Other care ethicists refine Noddings’ claim by emphasizing the practical and moral connections between proximate and distant relations, by affirming a principle of care for the most vulnerable on a global level, and by explicitly weaving a political component into care theory.

e. Care Ethics as Essentialist

The objection that care ethics is essentialist stems from the more general essentialist critique made by Elizabeth Spelman (1988). Following this argument, early versions of care ethics have been faulted for failing to explore the ways in which women (and others) differ from one another, and for thereby offering a uniform picture of moral development that reinforces sex stereotypes (Tronto, 1994). Critics challenge tendencies in care ethics to theorize care based on a dyadic model of a (care-giving) mother and a (care-receiving) child, on the grounds that it overly romanticizes motherhood and does not adequately represent the vast experiences of individuals (Hoagland, 1991). The charge of essentialism in care ethics highlights ways in which women and men are differently implicated in chains of care depending on variables of class, race, age, and more. Essentialism in care ethics is problematic not only because it is conceptually facile, but also because of its political implications for social justice. For example, in the United States women of color and white women are differently situated in terms of who is more likely to give and receive care, and of what degree and quality, because the least paid care workers predominantly continue to be women of color. Likewise, lesbian and heterosexual women are differently situated in being able to claim the benefits and burdens of marriage, and are not equally presumed to be fit as care-givers. Contemporary feminist care ethicists attempt to avoid essentialism by employing several strategies, including: more thoroughly illuminating the practices of care on multiple levels and from various perspectives; situating caring practices in place and time; construing care as the symbolic rather than actual voice of women; exploring the potential of care as a gender neutral activity; and being consistently mindful of perspective and privilege in the activity of moral theorizing.

f. Care Ethics as Ambiguous

Because it eschews abstract principles and decisional procedures, care ethics is often accused of being unduly ambiguous, and for failing to offer concrete guidance for ethical action (Rachels, 1999). Some care ethicists find the non-principled nature of care ethics to be overstated, noting that because a care perspective may eschew some principles does not mean that it eschews all principles entirely (Held, 1995). Principles that could be regarded as central to care ethics might pertain to the origin and basic need of care relations, the evaluation of claims of need, the obligation to care, and the scope of care distribution. On principle, it would seem, a care ethic guides the moral agent to recognize relational interdependency, care for the self and others, cultivate the skills of attention, response, respect, and completion, and maintain just and caring relationships. However, while theorists define care ethics as a theory derived from actual practices, they simultaneously resist subjectivism and moral relativism.

4. Feminine and Feminist Ethics

Because of its association with women, care ethics is often construed as a feminine ethic. Indeed, care ethics, feminine ethics, and feminist ethics are often treated as synonymous. But although they overlap, these are discrete fields in that although care ethics connotes feminine traits, not all feminine and feminist ethics are care ethics, and the necessary connection between care ethics and femininity has been subject to rigorous challenge. The idea that there may be a distinctly woman-oriented, or a feminine approach to ethics, can be traced far back in history. Attempts to legitimate this approach gained momentum in the 18^th and 19^th centuries, fueled by some suffragettes, who argued that granting voting rights to (white) women would lead to moral social improvements. Central assumptions of feminine ethics are that women are similar enough to share a common perspective, rooted in the biological capacity and expectation of motherhood, and that characteristically feminine traits include compassion, empathy, nurturance, and kindness.

But once it is acknowledged that women are diverse, and that some men exhibit equally strong tendencies to care, it is not readily apparent that care ethics is solely or uniquely feminine. Many women, in actuality and in myth, in both contemporary and past times, do not exhibit care. Other factors of social identity, such as ethnicity and class, have also been found to correlate with care thinking. Nonetheless, care has pervasively been assumed to be a symbolically feminine trait and perspective, and many women resonate with a care perspective. What differentiates feminine and feminist care ethics turns on the extent to which there is critical inquiry into the empirical and symbolic association between women and care, and concern for the power-related implications of this association. Alison Jaggar characterizes a feminist ethic as one which exposes masculine and other biases in moral theory, understands individual actions in the context of social practices, illuminates differences between women, provides guidance for private, public, and international issues, and treats the experiences of women respectfully, but not uncritically (Jaggar, 1991).

While most theorists agree that it is mistaken to view care ethics as a “woman’s morality”, the best way to understand its relation to sex and gender is disputed. Slote develops a strictly gender neutral theory of care on the grounds that care ethics can be traced to the work of male as well as female philosophers. Engster endorses a “minimally feminist theory of care” that is largely gender neutral because he defines care as meeting needs that are more generally human. Although he acknowledges that women are disadvantaged in current caring distributions and are often socialized to value self-effacing care, his theory is feminist only in seeking to assure that the basic needs of women and girls are met and their capabilities developed.

In contrast, Held, Kittay, and Tronto draft more robust overlaps between care and feminist theory, retaining yet challenging the gender-laden associations of care with language like “mothering persons” or “dependency workers”. While cautious of the associations between care and femininity, they find it useful to tap the resources of the lived and embodied experiences of women, a common one which is the capacity to birth children. They tend to define care as a practice partially in order to stay mindful of the ongoing empirical (if misguided) associations between care and women, that must inform utopian visions of care as a gender-neutral activity and virtue. Complicating things further, individuals who are sexed as women may nonetheless gain social privilege when they exhibit certain perceived traits of the male gender, such as being unencumbered and competitive, suggesting that it is potentially as important to revalue feminine traits and activities, as it is to stress the gender-neutral potential of care ethics.

As it currently stands, care ethicists agree that women are positioned differently than men in relation to caring practices, but there is no clear consensus about the best way to theorize sex and gender in care ethics.

5. Relation to Other Theories

Care ethics originally developed as an alternative to the moral theories of Kantian deontology and Utilitarianism consequentialism, but it is thought to have affinities with numerous other moral theories, such as African ethics, David Hume’s sentimentalism, Aristotelian virtue ethics, the phenomenology of Merleau-Ponty, Levinasian ethics, and Confucianism. The most pre-dominant of these comparisons has been between care ethics and virtue ethics, to the extent that care ethics is sometimes categorized as a form of virtue ethics, with care being a central virtue. The identification of caring virtues fuels the tendency to classify care ethics as a virtue ethic, although this system of classification is not universally endorsed.

Some theorists move to integrate care and virtue ethics for strategic reasons. Slote seeks to form an alliance against traditional “masculine” moral theories like Kantianism, utilitarianism, and social contract theory (Slote, 1998). He argues that, in so doing, care ethics receives a way of treating our obligations to people we don’t know, without having to supplement it with more problematic theories of justice. McLaren posits that virtue theory provides a normative framework which care ethics lacks (McLaren, 2001). The perceived flaw in care ethics for both authors is a neglect of justice standards in how care is distributed and practiced, and a relegation of care to the private realm, which exacerbates the isolation and individualization of the burdens of care already prevalent in liberal societies. McLaren contends that virtue theory provides care ethics both with a standard of appropriateness and a normative framework: “The standard of appropriateness is the mean—a virtue is always the mean between two extremes…The normative framework stems from the definition of virtue as that which promotes human flourishing” (2001, 105). Feminist critics, however, resist this assimilation on the grounds that it may dilute the unique focus of care ethics (Held, 2006; Sander-Staudt, 2006). They are optimistic that feminist versions of care ethics can address the above concerns of justice, and doubt that virtue ethics provides the best normative framework.

Similar debates surround the comparison between care ethics and Confucianism. Philosophers note a number of similarities between care ethics and Confucian ethics, not least that both theories are often characterized as virtue ethics (Li, 1994, 2000; Lai Tao, 2000). Additional similarities are that both theories emphasize relationship as fundamental to being, eschew general principles, highlight the parent-child relation as paramount, view moral responses as properly graduated, and identify emotions such as empathy, compassion, and sensitivity as prerequisites for moral response. The most common comparison is between the concepts of care and the Confucian concept of jen/ren. Ren is often translated as love of humanity, or enlargement. Several authors argue that there is enough overlap between the concepts of care and ren to judge that care ethics and Confucian ethics are remarkably similar and compatible systems of thought (Li, 1994; Rosemont, 1997).

However, some philosophers object that it is better to view care ethics as distinct from Confucian ethics, because of their potentially incompatible aspects. Feminist care ethicists charge that a feminist care ethic is not compatible with the way Confucianism subordinates women. Ranjoo Seodu Herr locates the incompatibility as between the Confucian significance of li, or formal standards of ritual, and a feminist care ethics’ resistance to subjugation (2003). For similar reasons, Lijun Yuan doubts that Confucian ethics can ever be acceptable to contemporary feminists, despite its similarity to care ethics. Daniel Star categorizes Confucian ethics as a virtue ethic, and distinguishes virtue ethics and care ethics as involving different biases in moral perception (2002). According to Star, care ethics differs from Confucian ethics in not needing to be bound with any particular tradition, in downgrading the importance of principles (versus merely noting that principles may be revised or suspended), and in rejecting hierarchical, role-based categories of relationship in favor of contextual and particular responses.

There are also refutations of the belief that care ethics is conceptually incompatible with the justice perspectives of Kantian deontology and liberal human rights theory. Care ethicists dispute the inference that because care and justice have evolved as distinct practices and ideals, that they are incompatible. Some deny that Kantianism is as staunchly principled and rationalistic as often portrayed, and affirm that care ethics is compatible with Kantian deontology because it relies upon a universal injunction to care, and requires a principle of caring obligation. An adaptation of the Kantian categorical imperative can be used to ground the obligation to care in the universal necessity of care, and the inconsistency of willing a world without intent to care. Other theorists compare the compatibility between care ethics and concepts of central importance to a Kantian liberal tradition. Thus, Grace Clement argues that an ideal of individual autonomy is required by normative ideals of care, in the sense that care-givers ideally consent to and retain some degree of autonomy in caring relations, and also ideally foster the autonomy of care-receivers (Clement, 1996). Mona Harrington explores the significance of the liberal ideal of equality to care ethics by tracing how women’s inequality is linked to the low social valuing and provision of care work (Harrington, 2000). Other ways that Kantianism is thought to benefit care ethics is by serving as a supplementary check to caring practice, (denouncing caring relations that use others as mere means), and by providing a rhetorical vehicle for establishing care as a right.

6. Maternalism

As a theory rooted in practices of care, care ethics emerged in large part from analyses of the reasoning and activities associated with mothering. Although some critics caution against the tendency to construe all care relations in terms of a mother-child dyad, Ruddick and Held use a maternal perspective to expand care ethics as a moral and political theory. In particular, Ruddick argues that “maternal practice” yields specific kinds of thinking and supports a principled resistance to violence. Ruddick notes that while some mothers support violence and war, they should not because of how it threatens the goals and substance of care. Defining a mother as “a person who takes responsibility for children’s lives and for whom providing child care is a significant part of his or her working life”, Ruddick stipulates that both men and women can be mothers (40). She identifies the following metaphysical attitudes, cognitive capacities, and virtues associated with mothering: preservative love (work of protection with cheerfulness and humility), fostering growth (sponsoring or nurturing a child’s unfolding), and training for social acceptability (a process of socialization that requires conscience and a struggle for authenticity). Because children are subject to, but defy social expectations, the powers of mothers are limited by the “gaze of the others”. Loving attention helps mothers to perceive their children and themselves honestly so as to foster growth without retreating to fantasy or incurring loss of the self.

Expanding on the significance of the bodily experience of pregnancy and birth, Ruddick reasons that mothers should oppose a sharp division between masculinity and femininity as untrue to children’s sexual identities. In so doing, mothers should challenge the rigid division of male and female aspects characteristic of military ideology because it threatens the hope and promise of birth. Ruddick creates a feminist account of maternal care ethics that is rooted in the vulnerability, promise, and power of human bodies, and that by resisting cheery denial, can transform the symbols of motherhood into political speech.

But however useful the paradigm for mothering has been to care ethics, many find it to be a limited and problematic framework. Some critics reject Ruddick’s suggestion that mothering is logically peaceful, noting that mothering may demand violent protectiveness and fierce response. Although Ruddick acknowledges that many mothers support military endeavors and undermine peace movements, some critics are unconvinced that warfare is always illogical and universally contrary to maternal practice. Despite Ruddick’s recognition of violence in mothering, others object that a motherhood paradigm offers a too narrowly dyadic and romantic paradigm, and that this approach mistakenly implies that characteristics of a mother-child relationship are universal worldly qualities of relationship. For these reasons, some care ethicists, even when in agreement over the significance of the mother-child relationship, have sought to expand the scope of care ethics by exploring other paradigms of care work, such as friendship and citizenship.

7. International Relations

Care ethics was initially viewed as having little to say about international relations. With an emphasis on known persons and particular selves, care ethics did not seem to be a moral theory suited to guide relations with distant or hostile others. Fiona Robinson challenges this idea, however, by developing a critical ethics of care that attends to the relations of dependency and vulnerability that exist on a global scale (Robinson, 1999). Robinson’s analysis expands the sentiment of care to address the inequalities within current international relations by promoting a care ethic that is responsive and attentive to the difference of others, without presuming universal homogeneity. She argues that universal principles of right and wrong typically fail to generate moral responses that alleviate the suffering of real people. But she is optimistic that a feminist phenomenological version of care ethics can do so by exploring the actual nature, conditions, and possibilities of global relations. She finds that the preoccupation with the nation state in cosmopolitanism and communitarianism, and the enforced global primacy of liberal values such as autonomy, independence, self-determination, and others, has led to a ‘culture of neglect’. This culture is girded by a systemic devaluing of interdependence, relatedness, and positive interaction with distant others. A critical ethic of care understands the global order not as emerging from a unified or homogeneous humanity, but from structures that exploit differences to exclude, marginalize and dominate. While Robinson doubts the possibility of “a more caring world” where poverty and suffering are entirely eliminated, she finds that a critical care ethic may offer an alternative mode of response that can motivate global care.

Likewise, Held is hopeful that care ethics can be used to transform international relations between states, by noticing cultural constructs of masculinity in state behaviors, and by calling for cooperative values to replace hierarchy and domination based on gender, class, race and ethnicity (Held, 2006). Care ethicists continue to explore how care ethics can be applied to international relations in the context of the global need for care and in the international supply and demand for care that is served by migrant populations of women.

8. Political Theory

As a political theory, care ethics examines questions of social justice, including the distribution of social benefits and burdens, legislation, governance, and claims of entitlement. One of the earliest explorations of the implications of care ethics for feminist political theory was in Seyla Behabib’s article “The Generalized and the Concrete Other: The Kohlberg-Gilligan Controversy and Feminist Theory” (Benhabib, 1986). Here, Benhabib traces a basic dichotomy in political and moral theory drawn between the public and private realms. Whereas the former is thought to be the realm of justice, the social and historical, and generalized others, the latter is thought to be the realm of the good life, the natural and atemporal, and concrete others. The former is captured by the favored metaphor of social contract theory and the “state of nature”, wherein men roam as adults, alone, independent, and free from the ties of birth by women. Benhabib traces this metaphor, internalized by the male ego, within the political philosophies of Thomas Hobbes, John Locke, and John Rawls, and the moral theories of Immanuel Kant and Lawrence Kohlberg. She argues that under this conception, human interdependency, difference, and questions about private life become irrelevant to politics.

The earliest substantial account of care as a political philosophy is offered by Tronto, who identifies the traditional boundary between ethics and politics as one of three boundaries which serves to stymie the political efficacy of a woman’s care ethic, (the other two being the boundary between the particular and abstract/impersonal moral observer, and the boundary between public and private life) (Tronto, 1993). Together, these boundaries obscure how care as a political concept illuminates the interdependency of human beings, and how care could stimulate democratic and pluralistic politics in the United States by extending a platform to the politically disenfranchised. Following Tronto, a number of feminist care ethicists explore the implications of care ethics for a variety of political concepts, including Bubeck who adapts Marxist arguments to establish the social necessity and current exploitation of the work of care; Sevenhuijsen who reformulates citizenship to be more inclusive of caring need and care work; and Kittay who develops a dependency based concept of equality (Bubeck, 1995; Sevenhuijsen, 1998; Kittay, 1999). Other authors examine the relevance of care ethics to the political issues of welfare policy, restorative justice, political agency, and global business.

The most comprehensive articulation of care ethics as a political theory is given by Engster, who defends a need based account of moral obligation (Engster, 2007). Engster’s “minimal capability theory” is formed around two major premises—that all human beings are dependent upon others to develop their basic capabilities, and that in receiving care, individuals tacitly and logically become obliged to care for others. Engster understands care as a set of practices normatively informed by three virtues: attention, responsiveness, and respect. Defining care as everything we do to satisfy vital biological needs, develop and sustain basic capabilities, and avoid unnecessary suffering, Engster applies these goals to domestic politics, economic justice, international relations, and culture. Engster holds governments and businesses responsible for offering economic provisions in times of sickness, disability, frail old age, bad luck, and reversal of fortune, for providing protection, health care, and clean environments, and for upholding the basic rights of individuals. He calls for businesses to balance caring and commodity production by making work and care more compatible, although he surmises that the goals of care need not fully subordinate economic ends such as profitability.

According to Engster, care as a political theory has universal application because conditions of dependency are ubiquitous, but care need not be practiced by all groups in the same way, and has no necessary affinities with any particular political system, including Marxism and liberalism. Governments ought to primarily care for their own populations, but should also help the citizens of other nations living under abusive or neglectful regimes, within reasonable limits. International humanitarian interventions are more obligatory than military given the risk of physical harm, and the virtues of care can help the international community avoid dangers associated with humanitarian assistance. With specific reference to cultural practices in the U.S., Engster recommends a number of policy changes to education, employment, and the media.

9. Caring for Animals

While Gilligan was relatively silent about the moral status of animals in care ethics, Noddings made it clear that humans have moral obligations only to animals which are proximate, open to caring completion, and capable of reciprocity. On these grounds she surmises that while the one-caring has a moral obligation to care for a stray cat that shows up at the door and to safely transport spiders out of the house, one is under no obligation to care for a stray rat or to become a vegetarian. She further rejects Peter Singer’s claim that it is specieist to favor humans over animals. Other care ethicists, however, such as Rita Manning, point out differences in our obligations to care for companion, domesticated, and wild animals based upon “carefully listening to the creatures who are with you in [a] concrete situation” (Manning, 1992; 1996).

The application of care ethics to the moral status of animals has been most thoroughly explored by Carol Adams and Josephine Donovan (Adams and Donovan 1996; 2007). Expanding on Adams’ original analysis of the sexual politics of meat (Adams, 1990), they maintain that a feminist care tradition offers a superior foundation for animal ethics. They specifically question whether rights theory is an adequate framework for an animal defense ethic because of its rationalist roots and individualist ontology, its tendency to extend rights to animals based on human traits, its devaluing of emotion and the body, and its preference for abstract, formal, and quantifiable rules. Alternatively, they argue that a feminist care ethic is a preferable foundation for grounding moral obligations to animals because its relational ontology acknowledges love and empathy as major bases for human-animal connections, and its contextual flexibility allows for a more nuanced consideration of animals across a continuum of difference.

Engster similarly argues that the human obligation to care for non-human animals is limited by the degree to which non-human animals are dependent upon humans (Engster, 2006). Because an obligation to care is rooted in dependency, humans do not have moral obligations to care for animals that are not dependent upon humans. However, an obligation to care for animals is established when humans make them dependent by providing food or shelter. Engster surmises that neither veganism nor vegetarianism are required providing that animals live happy, mature lives, and are humanely slaughtered, but also acknowledges that the vast majority of animals live under atrocious conditions that care ethics renounces.

Empirical studies suggest interesting differences between the way that men and women think about the moral status of animals, most notably, that women are more strongly opposed to animal research and meat eating, and report being more willing to sacrifice for these causes, than men (Eldridge and Gluck, 1996). While feminist care ethicists are careful not to take such empirical correlations as an automatic endorsement of these views, eco-feminists like Marti Kheel explicate the connection between feminism, animal advocacy, environmental ethics, and holistic health movements (Kheel, 2008). Developing a more stringent obligation to care for animals, Kheel posits the uniqueness of all animals, and broadens the scope of the moral obligation of care to include all individual beings as well as larger collectives, noting that the majority of philosophies addressing animal welfare adopt masculine approaches founded on abstract rules, rational principles, and generalized perspectives.

10. Applied Care Ethics

In addition to the above topics, care ethics has been applied to a number of timely ethical debates, including reproductive technology, homosexuality and gay marriage, capital punishment, political agency, hospice care, and HIV treatment, as well as aspects of popular culture, such as the music of U-2 and The Sopranos. It increasingly informs moral analysis of the professions, such as education, medicine, nursing, and business, spurring new topics and modes of inquiry. It is used to provide moral assessment in other ethical fields, such as bioethics, business ethics, and environmental ethics. Perhaps because medicine is a profession that explicitly involves care for others, care ethics was quickly adopted in bioethics as a means for assessing relational and embodied aspects of medical practices and policies. As well as abortion, both Susan Sherwin and Rosemary Tong consider how feminist ethics, including an ethic of care, provides new insights into contraception and sterilization, artificial insemination and in vitro fertilization, surrogacy, and gene therapy. Care ethics is also applied by other authors to organ transplantation, the care of high risk patients, artificial womb technologies, advanced directives, and the ideal relationships between medical practitioners and patients.

11. Care Movements

There are a rising number of social movements organized around the concerns highlighted in care ethics. In 2000, Deborah Stone called for a national care movement in the U.S. to draw attention to the need for social programs of care such as universal health care, pre-school education, care for the elderly, improved foster care, and adequate wages for care-givers. In 2006, Hamington and Dorothy Miller compiled a number of essays concerning the theoretical understanding and application of care ethics to public life, including issues of welfare, same-sex marriage, restorative justice, corporate globalization, and the 21^st century mother’s movement (Hamington and Miller, 2006). A number of formal political organizations of care exist, most of them on the internet, which variously center around themes of motherhood, fatherhood, health care, care as a profession, infant welfare, the woman’s movement, gay and lesbian rights, disability, and elder care. These organizations work to disseminate information, organize care advocates on key social issues, and form voting blocks. Of those focused around mothering, one of the most prominent is MomsRising.org, organized by Joan Blades, one of the original founders of MoveOn.org, and Kristin Rowe-Finkbeiner. Others include: The Mothers Movement Online, Mothers Ought to Have Equal Rights, the National Association of Mothers’ Centers, and Mothers and More. Judith Stadtman Tucker notes that problems with some mother’s movements include an overly exclusive focus on the interests of white, middle class care-givers, and an occasional lack of serious-mindedness, but she is also hopeful that care movements organized around motherhood can forge cultural transitions, including shorter work weeks, universal health care unhitched from employment, care leave policies, and increased levels of care work performed by men and states (Tucker, 2001).

12. References and Further Reading

Adams, Carol. The Sexual Politics of Meat. New York: Continuum, 1990.
Adams, C. and Donovan, J. Beyond Animal Rights: A feminist Caring Ethic for the Treatment of Animals. New York: Continuum, 1996.
Adams, C. and Donovan, J. The Feminist Care Tradition in Animal Ethics. New York: Columbia University Press, 2007.
Baier, Annette. “Hume: The Woman’s Moral Theorist?” in Women and Moral Theory, Kittay, Eva Feder, and Meyers, Diana (ed.s). U.S.A.: Rowman & Littlefield, 1987.
Baier, Annette. Moral Prejudices: Essays on Ethics. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1994.
Benhabib, Seyla. “The Generalized and Concrete Other: The Kohlberg-Gilligan Controversy and Moral Theory”, in Praxis International (1986) 38-60.
Blades, Joan and Rowe-Finkbeiner, Kristin. The Motherhood Manifesto: What America’s Moms Want and What to do about It. New York, NY: Nation Books, 2006.
Bowden, Peta. “An ‘Ethics of Care’ in Clinical Settings: Encompassing ‘Feminine” and “Feminist” Perspectives.” Nursing Philosophy 1.1 (2001): 36-49.
Bowden, Peta. Caring: Gender Sensitive Ethics. New York, NY: Routledge, 1997.
Brabeck, Mary. “Moral Judgment: Theory and Research on Differences between males and Females” Developmental Review 3 (1983) 274-91.
Bubeck, Diemut. Care, Gender and Justice. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995.
Card, Claudia. “Caring and Evil.” Hypatia 5.1 (1990) 101-8.
Clement, Grace. Care, Autonomy and Justice: Feminism and the Ethic of Care. Boulder, CO: Westview Press, 1996.
Davion, Victoria. “Autonomy, Integrity, and Care” Social Theory and Practice 19.2 (1993) 161-82.
Donovan, Josephine and Adams, Carol, ed. Beyond Animal Rights: A Feminist Caring Ethic for the Treatment of Animals. New York, NY: Continuum Press, 1996.
Engster, Daniel. “Care ethics and Animal Welfare.” Journal of Social Philosophy 37.4 (2006): 521.
Engster, Daniel. The Heart of Justice. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007.
Friedman, Marilyn. “Beyond Caring: The De-Moralization of Gender” in V. Held, Justice and Care: Essential Readings in Feminist Ethics Boulder, CO: Westview Press (2006): 61-77.
Fry, Sara T. “The Role of Caring in a Theory of Nursing Ethics.” Hypatia 4.2. (1989): 88-101.
Gilligan, Carol. “Women’s Place in Man’s Life Cycle.” Harvard Educational Review, 29. (1979).
Gilligan, C. In A Different Voice. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1982.
Gilligan, C. “Adult Development and Women’s Development: Arrangements for a Marriage” in J. Giele, ed. Women in the Middle Years. New York: Wiley-Interscience Publications, John Wiley and Sons (1982).
Gilligan, C. “Reply” (to critics). Signs 11.2. (1986): 324-333.
Gilligan, C. and Belenky, M. “A Naturalist Study of Abortion Decisions.” In R. Selman and R. Yando (ed.s) New Directions in Child Development: Clinical-Developmental Psychology. 7. San-Francisco, CA: Jossey-Bass. (1980): 69-90.
Gilligan, C. Langdale, S. Lyons, N. & Murphy, J. The Contribution of Women’s Thought to Developmental Theory: The Elimination of Sex Bias in Moral Developmental research and Education. Final Report to the National Institute of Education. Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press, 1982.
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Gilligan, Ward, Taylor, and Bardige. Mapping the Moral Domain: A Contribution of Women’s Thinking to Psychological Theory and Education. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1988.
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Hamington, Maurice. Embodied Care: Jane Addams, Maurice Merleau-Ponty and Feminist Ethics. Chicago, IL: University of Illinois Press, 2004.
Hamington, Maurice and Miller, Dorothy, ed. Socializing Care. New York: NY: Rowman & Littlefield, 2006.
Hanen, Marsha and Nelson, Kai, ed.s. Science, Morality, and Feminist Theory. Calgary: University of Calgary Press, 1987.
Harding, Sandra. “The Curious Coincidence of Feminine and African Moralities.” In Women and Moral Theory. Ed. Kittay, Eva Feder and Meyers, Diane. U.S.A: Rowman & Littlefield, 1989. 296-317.
Harrington, Mona. Care and Equality: Inventing a New Family Politics. New York, NY: Routledge, 2000.
Held, Virginia. Feminist Morality: Transforming Culture, Society, and Politics. Chicago, IL: University of Chicago Press, 1993.
Held, Virginia. “Feminist Moral Inquiry and the Feminist Future” in V. Held (ed.) Justice and Care. Boulder, Co: Westview Press, 2006: 153-176.
Held, Virginia. The Ethics of Care. New York, NY: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Herr, Ranjoo Seodu. “Is Confucianism Compatible with care ethics?: A Critique.” Philosophy East and West 53.4: 471-489.
Hoagland, Sarah. Lesbian Ethics. Palo Alto, CA: Institute of Lesbian Studies, 1988.
Hoagland, Sarah Lucia. “Some Thoughts about Caring.” Feminist Ethics. Ed. Claudia Card. Lawrence, KS: University of Kansas Press, 1991.
Jaggar, Allison. “”Feminist Ethics: Problems, Projects, Prospects.” Feminist Ethics. Lawrence, Kansas: University of Kansas, 1991. 78- 104.
Kheel, Marti. Nature Ethics. New York, NY: Rowman & Littlefield, 2008.
Kittay, Eva Feder and Myers, Diana T., ed. Women and Moral Theory. U.S.A.: Rowman and Littlefield, 1987.
Kittay, Eva Feder. Love’s Labor: Essays on Women, Equality, and Dependency. New York, NY: Routledge, 1999.
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Kuhse, Helga. Caring: Nurses, Women and Ethics. Oxford: Blackwell, 1997.
Kuhse, H. “Clinical Nursing: ‘Yes’ to Caring, ‘No’ to Female Ethics of Care.” Bioethics 9.3 (1995): 207-219.
Lai Tao, Julia Po-Wah. “Two Perspectives of Care: Confucian Ren and Feminst Care.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 27.2 (2000): 215-40.
Larrabee, Mary Jeane, ed. An Ethic of Care: Feminist and Interdisciplinary Perspectives. New York, NY: Routledge, 1993.
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Author Information

Maureen Sander-Staudt
Email: Maureen.Sander-Staudt@asu.edu
Arizona State University
U. S. A.

Augustine: Political and Social Philosophy

St. Augustine (354-430 C.E.), originally named Aurelius Augustinus, was the Catholic bishop of Hippo in northern Africa. He was a skilled Roman-trained rhetorician, a prolific writer (who produced more than 110 works over a 30-year period), and by wide acclamation, the first Christian philosopher. Writing from a unique background and vantage point as a keen observer of society before the fall of the Roman Empire, Augustine’s views on political and social philosophy constitute an important intellectual bridge between late antiquity and the emerging medieval world. Because of the scope and quantity of his work, many scholars consider him to have been the most influential Western philosopher.

Although Augustine certainly would not have thought of himself as a political or social philosopher per se, the record of his thoughts on such themes as the nature of human society, justice, the nature and role of the state, the relationship between church and state, just and unjust war, and peace all have played their part in the shaping of Western civilization. There is much in his work that anticipates major themes in the writings of moderns like Machiavelli, Luther, Calvin and, in particular, Hobbes.

Background
Foundational Political and Social Concepts
War and Peace
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Background

a. Historical Context

Augustine’s political and social views flow directly from his theology. The historical context is essential to understanding his purposes. Augustine, more than any other figure of late antiquity, stands at the intellectual intersection of Christianity, philosophy, and politics. As a Christian cleric, he takes it as his task to defend his flock against the unremitting assault by heresies spawned in an era uninformed by the immediate, divine revelations which had characterized the apostolic age. As a philosopher, he situates his arguments against the backdrop of Greek philosophy in the Platonic tradition, particularly as formulated by the Neo-Platonists of Alexandria. As a prominent Roman citizen, he understands the Roman Empire to be the divinely-ordained medium through which the truths of Christianity are to be both spread and safeguarded.

Augustine died reciting the Penitential Psalms as the Vandals besieged the city of Hippo on the coast of northern Africa (now the city of Annaba, in Algeria). This occurred two decades after the sacking of Rome by Alaric.

b. Augustinian Political “Theory”

Augustine’s willingness to grapple with substantive political and social issues does not mean, however, that the presentation of his ideas comes pre-packaged as a simple system—or even as a system at all. Quite the contrary, his political arguments are scattered throughout his voluminous writings, which include autobiography, sermons, expositions, commentaries, letters, and Christian apologetics. Moreover, the contexts in which the political and social issues are addressed are equally varied.

Nevertheless, it would be a mistake to suggest that his arguments are not informed by a cogent theory. Taken together, his political and social musings constitute a remarkable tapestry. Indeed, the consistency evident in the expression of his varied but related ideas leads both fairly and directly to the assumption that Augustine’s political-philosophical statements arise from a consistent set of premises which guide him to his conclusions; in other words, they reveal the presence of an underlying, if unstated, theory.

c. The Augustinian World View

Because Augustine considers the Christian scriptures to constitute the touchstone against which philosophy—including political philosophy—must be assayed, his world view necessarily includes the Christian tenets of the Creation, the Fall of man, and the Redemption. In stark contrast to the pagan philosophers who preceded him—who viewed the unfolding of history as a cyclical phenomenon, Augustine conceives history in strictly linear terms, with a beginning and an end. According to Augustine, the earth was brought into existence ex nihilo by a perfectly good and just God, who created man. The earth is not eternal; the earth, as well as time, has both a beginning and an end.

Man, on the other hand, was brought into existence to endure eternally. Damnation is the just desert of all men because of the Fall of Adam, who, having been created with free will, chose to disrupt the perfectly good order established by God. As the result of Adam’s Fall, all human beings are heirs to the effects of Adam’s original sin, and all are vessels of pride, avarice, greed and self-interest. For reasons known only to God, He has predestined some fixed number of men for salvation (as a display of His unmerited mercy—a purely gratuitous act altogether independent even of God’s foreknowledge of any good deeds those men might do while on earth), while most He has predestined for damnation as a just consequence of the Fall. The onward march of human history, then, constitutes the unfolding of the divine plan which will culminate in one or the other outcome for every member of the human family.

Within this framework of political and legal systems, the state is a divinely ordained punishment for fallen man, with its armies, its power to command, coerce, punish, and even put to death, as well as its institutions such as slavery and private property. God shapes the ultimate ends of man’s existence through it. The state simultaneously serves the divine purposes of chastening the wicked and refining the righteous. Also simultaneously, the state constitutes a sort of remedy for the effects of the Fall, in that it serves to maintain such modicum of peace and order as it is possible for fallen man to enjoy in the present world.

While it is not clear that God predestines every event during man’s sojourn on earth, nothing happens in contravention of His designs. In any case, predestination fixes the ultimate destination of every human being—as well as the political states to which they belong. Hence, predestination for Augustine is the proverbial elephant in the room. Whether predestination was divinely contemplated prior or incidental to the Fall (a point which Augustine never clearly articulates), the following problem arises: If one is to be saved or damned by divine fiat, what difference does it make whether the world possesses the social order of a state? For those who are predestined for damnation, what is the point of their being “chastened” (or a means to encourage their reformation) by the state? For those predestined for salvation, what is the point of their being refined by the vicissitudes of life in a political state? In order to prevent the collapse of such a systematic account of the human condition as Augustine provides, the question simply must be set aside as a matter unknowable to finite man. However, this means that the best Augustine can hope to accomplish is to provide a description of political life on earth, but not a prescription for how to obtain membership in the perfect society of heaven; for, even strict obedience to Christian precepts will not compensate for one’s not being gratuitously elected for salvation.

As the social fabric of the world around him unravels in the twilight years of the Roman Empire, Augustine attempts to elucidate the relationship between the eternal, invisible verities of his faith and the stark realities of the present, observable political and social conditions of humanity. At the intersection of these two concerns, Augustine finds what for him is the central question of politics: How do the faithful operate successfully but justly in an unjust world, where selfish interests dominate, where the general welfare is rarely sought, and where good and evil men are inextricably (and, to human eyes, often unidentifiably) intermingled, yet search for a heavenly reward in the world hereafter?

2. Foundational Political and Social Concepts

a. Two Cities

Even though those elected for salvation and those elected for damnation are thoroughly intermingled, the distinction arising from their respective destinies gives rise to two classes of persons, to whom Augustine refers collectively and allegorically as cities—the City of God and the earthly city. Citizens of the earthly city are the unregenerate progeny of Adam and Eve, who are justifiably damned because of Adam’s Fall. These persons, according to Augustine, are aliens to God’s love (not because God refuses to love them, but because they refuse to love God as evidenced by their rebellious disposition inherited from the Fall). Indeed, the object of their love—whatever it may be—is something other than God. In particular, citizens of the “earthly city” are distinguished by their lust for material goods and for domination over others. On the other hand, citizens of the City of God are “pilgrims and foreigners” who (because God, the object of their love, is not immediately available for their present enjoyment) are very much out of place in a world without an earthly institution sufficiently similar to the City of God. No political state, nor even the institutional church, can be equated with the City of God. Moreover, there is no such thing as “dual citizenship” in the two cities; every member of the human family belongs to one—and only one.

b. Justice and the State

The Augustinian notion of justice includes what by his day was a well-established definition of justice of “giving every man his due.” However, Augustine grounds his application of the definition in distinctively Christian philosophical commitments: “justice,” says Augustine, “is love serving God only, and therefore ruling well all else.” Accordingly, justice becomes the crucial distinction between ideal political states (none of which actually exist on earth) and non-ideal political states—the status of every political state on earth. For example, the Roman Empire could not be synonymous with the City of God precisely because it lacked true justice as defined above; and since, “where there is no justice there is no commonwealth,” Rome could not truly be a commonwealth, that is, an ideal state. “Remove justice,” Augustine asks rhetorically, “and what are kingdoms but gangs of criminals on a large scale? What are criminal gangs but petty kingdoms?” No earthly state can claim to possess true justice, but only some relative justice by which one state is more just than another. Likewise, the legitimacy of any earthly political regime can be understood only in relative terms: The emperor and the pirate have equally legitimate domains if they are equally just.

Nevertheless, political states, imperfect as they are, serve a divine purpose. At the very least, they serve as vehicles for maintaining order and for preventing what Hobbes will later call the “war of all against all.” In that respect, the state is a divine gift and an expression of divine mercy—especially if the state is righteously ruled. The state maintains order by keeping wicked men in check through the fear of punishment. Although God will eventually punish the sins of all those elected for damnation, He uses the state to levy more immediate punishments against both the damned and the saved (or against the wicked and the righteous, the former dichotomy not necessarily synonymous with the latter). Rulers, as God’s ministers, punish the guilty and always are justified in punishing sins “against nature,” and circumstantially justified in punishing sins “against custom” or “against the laws.” The latter two categories of sins change from time to time. In this regard, the institution of the state marks a relative return to order from the chaos of the Fall. Rulers have the right to establish any law that does not conflict with the law of God. Citizens have the duty to obey their political leaders regardless of whether the leader is wicked or righteous. There is no right of civil disobedience. Citizens are always duty bound to obey God; and when the imperatives of obedience to God and obedience to civil authority conflict, citizens must choose to obey God and willingly accept the punishment of disobedience. Nevertheless, those empowered to levy punishment should take no delight in the task. For example, the prayer of the judge who condemns a man to death should be, as Augustine’s urges, “From my necessities [of imposing judgment to a person] deliver thou me.”

c. Church and State

Even though the ostensible reason for the state’s divinely appointed existence is to assist and bless humankind, there is no just state, says Augustine, because men reject the thing that best could bring justice to an imperfect world, namely, the teachings of Christ. Augustine does not suggest that current rejection of Christ’s teachings means that all hope for future amendment and reformation is lost. However, Augustine’s whole tenor is that there is no reason to expect that the political jurisdictions of this world ever will be anything different than what they now are, if the past is any predictor of the future. Hence, Augustine concludes that

Christ’s servants, whether they are kings, or princes, or judges, or soldiers . . . are bidden, if need be, to endure the wickedness of an utterly corrupt state, and by that endurance to win for themselves a place of glory . . . in the Heavenly Commonwealth, whose law is the will of God.

Augustine clearly holds that the establishment and success of the Roman Empire, along with its embracing of Christianity as its official religion, was part of the divine plan of the true God. Indeed, he holds that the influence of Christianity upon the empire could be only salutary in its effect:

Were our religion listened to as it deserves,” says Augustine, “it would establish, consecrate, strengthen, and enlarge the commonwealth in a way beyond all that Romulus, Numa, Brutus, and all the other men of renown in Roman history achieved.

Still, while Augustine doubtless holds that it is better for Rome to be Christian than not, he clearly recognizes that officially embracing Christianity does not automatically transform an earthly state into the City of God. Indeed, he regards Rome as “a kind of second Babylon.” Even if the Roman Emperor and the Roman Pontiff were one and the same—even if the structures of state and church merged so as to become institutionally the same—they would not thereby become the City of God, because citizenship in the City of God is determined at the individual and not the institutional level.

Augustine does not wish ill for Rome. Quite the contrary, he supplicates God for Rome’s welfare, since hebelongs to it, in temporal terms at least. He sees Rome as the last bastion against the advances of the pagan barbarians, who surely must not be allowed to overrun the mortal embodiment of Christendom that Rome represents. Nevertheless, Augustine cannot be overly optimistic about the future of the Roman state as such—not because it is Rome, but because it is a state; for any society of men other than the City of God is part and parcel of the earthly city, which is doomed to inevitable demise. Even so, states like Rome can perform the useful purpose of championing the cause of the Church, protecting it from assault and compelling those who have fallen away from fellowship with it to return to the fold. Indeed, it is entirely within the provinces of the state to punish heretics and schismatics.

3. War and Peace

a. War Among Nations

Inasmuch as the history of human society is largely the history of warfare, it seems quite natural for Augustine to explain war as being within God’s unfolding plan for human history. As Augustine states, “It rests with the decision of God in his just judgment and mercy either to afflict or console mankind, so that some wars come to an end more speedily, others more slowly.”

Wars serve the function of putting mankind on notice, as it were, of the value of consistently righteous living. Although one might feel to call upon Augustine to defend the notion that God can, with propriety, use so terrible a vehicle as war to chasten the wicked, two points must be kept in mind: The first point is that, for Augustine, all of God’s acts are just, by definition, even if the application of that definition to specific cases of the human experience eludes human reasoning. This point invites a somewhat more philosophically intriguing question: Is it just to compel men to do good who, when left to their own devices, would prefer evil? If one were forced to act righteously contrary to his or her will, is it not the case that he or she would still lack the change of heart that is necessary to produce a repentant attitude—an attitude that results in genuine reformation? Perhaps; but Augustine is unwilling to concede that it is better, in the name of recognizing the agency of others, to let them continue to wallow in evil practices. Augustine argues,

The aim towards which a good will compassionately devotes its efforts is to secure that a bad will be rightly directed. For who does not know that a man is not condemned on any other ground than because his bad will deserved it, and that no man is saved who has not a good will?

Exactly how God is to bring about his good purposes through the process of war may not be clear to man in any particular case. Any who acquire a glimpse of understanding as to why the divine economy operates as it does truly possess a good will and shall not hesitate to administer to those erring, according to God’s direction, the punitive discipline that war is intended to bring. Moreover, those of good will shall administer discipline to those erring by moving them toward repentance and reformation.

All of this leads conveniently to a second point: War can bring the need to discipline by chastening. Those of good will do not manifest cruelty in the proper administration of punishment but, rather, in the withholding of punishment. “It does not follow,” Augustine states, “that those who are loved should be cruelly left to yield themselves with impunity to their bad will; but in so far as power is given, they ought to be both prevented from evil and compelled to good.” What if, however, the violence of war serves only to subdue the wrongdoings of the wicked but fails to produce the change of heart that would characterize the transition from a bad to a good will—much like the case of the criminal who is sentenced to prison but who feels no remorse for his or her actions and, given his or her freedom, would all too readily repeat the crime? For Augustine, it is always better to restrain an evil man from the commission of evil acts than it is to permit his continued perpetration of those acts. As for the evil but unrepentant man, it would seem that he will have failed to reap the intended benefit of God’s chastening, which, reckoned by any measure, is a great tragedy indeed.

For Augustine, even the death of the mortal body, as ultimate a penalty as it might appear from the mortal perspective, is not nearly so serious a consequence as that which would ensue if one is left to wallow in sin: “But great and holy men, although they at the time knew excellently well that that death which separates the soul from the body is not to be dreaded, yet, in accordance with the sentiment of those who might fear it, punished some sins with death, both because the living were struck with a salutary fear, and because it was not death itself that would injure those who were being punished with death, but sin, which might be increased if they continued to live.”

Writing after the time when Christianity became the official religion of the Roman Empire, Augustine holds that there is no prohibition against a Christian serving the state as a soldier in its army. Neither is there any prohibition against taking the lives of the enemies of the state, so long as he does it in his public capacity as a soldier and not in the private capacity of a murderer. Nevertheless, Augustine also urges that soldiers should go to war mournfully and never take delight in the shedding of blood.

b. War and Human Nature

If, however, the presence of war serves as a defining characteristic of the earthly city, why does Augustine not pursue the course taken by some of the Latin Patristic writers who precede him by labeling war and military service as merely a “worldly” institution in which true Christians have no place. The answer seems to lie in Augustine’s world view, which differs from that of many of his predecessors in terms of his optimism for man to comprehend the ultimate verities, live in an orderly manner and find his way back to God. He becomes quite pessimistic though in his view of human nature and of the ability and desire of humans to maintain themselves orderly, much less rightly. Pride, vanity and the lust for domination entice men toward waging wars and committing all manner of violence, because of men’s tendency to do evil as the result of Adam’s Fall. Augustine holds that, given the inextricable mixing of citizens of the two cities, the total avoidance of war or its effects is a practical impossibility for all men, including the righteous. Happily, he holds that the day will come when, coincident with the end of the earthly city, wars will no longer be fought. For, says Augustine, citing words from the Psalms to the effect that God will one day bring a cessation of all wars,

This not yet see we fulfilled: yet are there wars, wars among nations for sovereignty; among sects, among Jews, Pagans, Christians, heretics, are wars, frequent wars, some for the truth, some for falsehood contending. Not yet then is this fulfilled, ‘He maketh wars to cease unto the end of the earth;’ but haply it shall be fulfilled.

For the present, however, man—particularly Christian man—is left with the question of how to live in a world full of war.

c. The Just War

As the Roman Empire collapses around him, Augustine confronted the question of what justifies warfare for a Christian. On the one hand, the wicked are not particularly concerned about just wars. On the other hand, the righteous vainly hope to avoid being affected by wars in this life, and at best they can hope for just wars rather than unjust ones. This is by no means a perfect solution; but then again, this is not a perfect world. If it were, all talk of just wars would be altogether nonsensical. Perfect solutions characterize only the heavenly City of God. Its pilgrim citizens sojourning on earth can do no better than try to cope with the present difficulties and imperfections of the earthly life. Thus, for Augustine, the just war is a coping mechanism for use by the righteous who aspire to citizenship in the City of God. In terms of the traditional notion of jus ad bellum (justice of war, that is, the circumstances in which wars can be justly fought), war is a coping mechanism for righteous sovereigns who would ensure that their violent international encounters are minimal, a reflection of the Divine Will to the greatest extent possible, and always justified. In terms of the traditional notion of jus in bello (justice in war, or the moral considerations which ought to constrain the use of violence in war), war is a coping mechanism for righteous combatants who, by divine edict, have no choice but to subject themselves to their political masters and seek to ensure that they execute their war-fighting duty as justly as possible. Sometimes that duty might arise in the most trying of circumstances, or under the most wicked of regimes; for

Christ’s servants, whether they are kings, or princes, or judges, or soldiers, or provincials, whether rich or poor, freemen or slaves, men or women, are bidden, if need be, to endure the wickedness of an utterly corrupt state, and by that endurance to win for themselves a place of glory

hereafter in the heavenly City of God.

In sum, why would a man like Augustine, whose eye is fixed upon attainment of citizenship in the heavenly city, find it necessary to delineate what counts as a just war in this lost and fallen world? In general terms, the demands of moral life are so thoroughly interwoven with social life that the individual cannot be separated from citizenship in one or the other city. In more specific terms, the just man who walks by faith needs to understand how to cope with the injustices and contradictions of war as much as he needs to understand how to cope with all other aspects of the present world where he is a stranger and pilgrim. Augustine takes important cues from both Cicero and Ambrose and synthesizes their traditions into a Christianized world view that still retains strong ties to the pre-Christian philosophic past. He resolves the dilemma of just war and pacifist considerations by denying the dilemma: war is simply a part of the human experience that God Himself has ordained or permitted. War arises from, and stands as a clear manifestation of, the nature of fallen man. For adherents to nominal Christianity, the explanatory power of Augustine’s thoughts on just war is substantial; his approach enables Christians to understand just war as a coping mechanism for just men who are trying to get along as morally (if not as piously) as they can in an imperfect world.

However, since Augustine seeks to resolve the nature of his ethical tensions, the synthetic character of Augustine’s approach to war is important, not merely for adherents to Christianity, but also for others seeking a strictly rational account of the problem. For example, if one were to take a de-theologized view of Augustine’s approach and focus simply upon the general theoretical problem of the morality of war, Augustine’s attempt fully deserves serious philosophical consideration. His approach explains how a morally upright citizen of a relatively just state could be justified in pursuing warfare, in prosecuting war, and ultimately, although unhappily, in taking human life. In any case, Augustine’s just war theory arises from his most deeply rooted philosophical assumptions. Augustine as a Christian philosopher achieves a full synthesis of the Roman and Christian values associated with war in a way that legitimizes war as an instrument of national policy which, although inferior to the perfect ideals of Christianity, is one which Christians cannot altogether avoid and with which they must in some sense make their peace.

d. Jus ad Bellum and Jus in Bello

Traditionally, the philosophical treatment of the just war is divided into two categories: jus in bellum and jus in bello. The former describes the necessary (and, by some accounts, sufficient) conditions for justifying engagement in war. The latter describes the necessary conditions for conducting war in a just manner.

Augustine’s jus ad bellum prescripts enjoin that wars can be initiated justly only on the basis of:

1. a just cause, such as to defend the state from external invasion; to defend the safety or honor of the state, with the realization that their simultaneous defense might be impossible; to avenge injuries; to punish a nation for failure to take corrective action for wrongs (legal or moral ) committed by its citizens; to come to the defense of allies; to gain the return of something that was wrongfully taken; or to obey a divine command to go to war (which, in practice, issues from the political head of state acting as God’s lieutenant on earth); and in any case, the just cause must be at least more just than the cause of one’s enemies;

2. a rightly intended will, which has the restoration of peace as its prime objective, takes no delight in the wickedness of potential adversaries, views waging war as a stern necessity, tolerates no action calculated to provoke a war, and does not seek to conquer others merely for conquest’s sake or for territorial expansion; and

3. a declaration of war by a competent authority, and except in the most unusual of circumstances, in a public manner, and only as a last resort.

Concerning jus in bello, Augustine holds that wars, once begun, must be fought in a manner which:

1. represents a proportional response to the wrong to be avenged, with violence being constrained within the limits of military necessity;

2. discriminates between proper objects of violence (that is, combatants) and noncombatants, such as women, children, the elderly, the clergy, and so forth.; and

3. observes good faith in its interactions with the enemy, by scrupulously observing treaties and not prosecuting the war in a treacherous manner.

e. Augustine’s Conception of Peace

Both Augustine’s political world view and his approach to war incorporate his conception of peace. According to Augustine, God designed all humans to live together in the “bond of peace.” However, fallen man lives in society as according to the divine will or as opposing it. Augustine distinguishes the two cities in several important ways, as well as the kind of peace they seek:

There is, in fact, one city of men who choose to live by the standard of the flesh, another of those who choose to live by the standard of the spirit. The citizens of each of these desire their own kind of peace, and when they achieve their aim, that is the kind of peace in which they live.

Because the common choice of fallen man is a peace of his own liking—one that selfishly serves his own immediate or foreseeable ends, peace becomes, in practice, merely an interlude between ongoing states of war. Augustine is quick to point out that this life carries with it no guarantee of peace; that blessed state is reserved for the saved in heaven.

Augustine delineates three kinds of peace: the ultimate and perfect peace which exists exclusively in the City of God, the interior peace enjoyed by the pilgrim citizens of the City of God as they sojourn on earth, and the peace which is common to the two cities. Sadly, Augustine is abundantly clear that temporal peace is rather an anomalous condition in the totality of human history and that perfect peace is altogether unattainable on earth:

Such is the instability of human affairs that no people has ever been allowed such a degree of tranquility as to remove all dread of hostile attacks on their dwelling in this world. That place, then, which is promised as a dwelling of such peace and security is eternal, and is reserved for eternal beings.

However, Augustine insists that, by any estimation, it is in the best interest of everyone—saint or sinner—to try to keep the peace here and now; and indeed, establishing and maintaining an earthly peace is as fundamental to the responsibilities of the state as protecting the state in times of war.

As for the church’s quest for peace, he writes, “it seems to me that no limit can be set to the number of persecutions which the Church is bound to suffer for her training;” and he opines that persecutions will continue until the final scenes of the current state of human history incidental to the second coming of Christ. Interestingly, Augustine gives no suggestion whatsoever that the rest of the earth will be at peace while this violence against the church continues. On the contrary, the entire tenor of his argument suggests that anti-Christian violence is merely typical of the violence and disorder that will accompany the human experience until the second coming of Christ.

While men do not agree on which kind of peace to seek, all agree that peace in some form is the end they desire to achieve. Even in war, all parties involved desire—and fight to obtain—some kind of peace. Ironically, although peace is the end toward which wars are fought, war seems to be the more enduring, more characteristic of the two states in the human experience. War is the natural (albeit lamentable) state in which fallen man finds himself. The flesh and the spirit of man—although both are good—are in perpetual opposition:

But what in fact, do we achieve, when we desire to be made perfect by the Highest Good? It can, surely, only be a situation where the desires of the flesh do not oppose the spirit, and where there is in us no vice for the spirit to oppose with its desires. Now we cannot achieve this in our present life, for all our wishing. But we can at least, with God’s help, see to it that we do not give way to the desires of the flesh which oppose the spirit to be overcome, and that we are not dragged to the perpetration of sin with our own consent.

Augustine concludes that war among men and nations cannot be avoided altogether because it is simply characteristic of the present existence. The contention that typifies war is merely the social counterpart to the spirit-body tension that typifies every individual person. However, man can, through the general application of divine precepts contained in scripture and through the pursuit of virtue as dictated by reason, manage that tension both on the individual and societal levels in such a way as to obtain a transitory peace. War and peace are two sides of the same Augustinian coin. Owing to the injustice that is inherent in the mortal state, the former is presently unavoidable, and the latter, in its perfect manifestation, is presently unattainable.

4. Conclusion

In sum, the state is an institution imposed upon fallen man for his temporal benefit, even if the majority of men will not ultimately benefit from it in light of their predestination to damnation. However, if one can successfully set aside Augustine’s doctrine of predestination, one finds in his writings an enormously valuable descriptive account of the psychology of fallen man, which can take the reader a very great distance toward understanding social interactions among men and nations. Although the doctrine of predestination is indispensable for understanding Augustine’s theology, its prominence does not preclude one from reaping value from his appraisal of the state of man and his political and social relationships in the fallen “earthly city,” to which all either belong or with which they have unavoidable contact.

5. References and Further Reading

All the primary sources are readily available in English.

a. Primary Sources

Augustine. City of God [De civitate Dei]. Translated by Marcus Dods, in The Nicene and Post-Nicene Fathers. Edited by Philip Schaff. First Series. Vol. II. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans Publishing Company, 1956.
Augustine. On Christian Doctrine [De doctrina christiana]. Translated by J. F. Shaw, in The Nicene and Post-Nicene Fathers. Edited by Philip Schaff. First Series. Vol. II. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans Publishing Company, 1956.
Augustine. On Free Choice of the Will [De libero arbitrio libri III]. Translated by Anna S. Benjamin and L. H. Hackstaff. New York: Macmillan Publishing Company, 1964.
Augustine. Our Lord’s Sermon on the Mount [De Sermone Domini in Monte secundum Matthaeum]. Translated by William Findlay, in The Nicene and Post-Nicene Fathers. Edited by Philip Schaff. First Series. Vol. VI. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans Publishing Company, 1956.

b. Secondary Sources

Bainton, Roland H. Christian Attitudes Toward War and Peace: A Historical Survey and Critical Re-evaluation. Nashville: Abington Press, 1960.
- On Augustine and War.
Battenhouse, Roy W. A Companion to the Study of St. Augustine. New York: Oxford University Press, 1969.
Deane, Herbert A. The Political and Social Ideas of St. Augustine. New York: Columbia University Press, 1963.
- The indispensable and definitive work on Augustine’s political and social philosophy.
Gilson, Etienne. The Christian Philosophy of Saint Augustine. New York: Random House, 1960.
Mattox, John Mark. St. Augustine and the Theory of Just War. London: Thoemmes Continuum, 2006.
- On Augustine and War.
Swift, Louis J. The Early Fathers on War and Military Service. Wilmington: Michael Glazier, Inc., 1983.
- On Augustine and War.

Author Information

John Mark Mattox
Email: john.mark.mattox@ndu.edu
U. S. A.

Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph von Schelling (1775—1854)

F. W. J. von Schelling is one of the great German philosophers of the late 18^th and early 19^th Century. Some historians and scholars of philosophy have classified him as a German Idealist, along with J. G. Fichte and G. W. F. Hegel. Such classifications obscure rather than illuminate the importance and singularity of Schelling’s place in the history of philosophy. This is because the dominant and most often limited understanding of Idealism as systematic metaphysics of the Subject is applicable more to Hegel’s philosophy than Schelling’s. While initiating the Post-Kantian Idealism of the Subject, Schelling went on to exhibit in his later works the limit and dissolution of such a systemic metaphysics of the Subject. Therefore, the convenient label of Schelling as one German Idealist amongst others ignores the singularity of Schelling’s philosophy and the complex relationship he had with the movement of German Idealism.

The real importance of Schelling’s later works lies in the exposure of the dominant systemic metaphysics of the Subject to its limit rather than in its confirmation. In this way, the later works of Schelling demand from the students and philosophers of German Idealism a re-assessment of the notion of German Idealism itself. In that sense, the importance and influence of Schelling’s philosophy has remained “untimely.” In the wake of Hegelian rational philosophy that was the official philosophy of that time, Schelling’s later works was not influential and fell onto deaf ears. Only in the twentieth century when the question of the legitimacy of the philosophical project of modernity had come to be the concern for philosophers and thinkers, did Schelling’s radical opening of philosophy to “post-metaphysical” thinking receive renewed attention.

This is because it is perceived that the task of philosophical thinking is no longer the foundational act of the systematic metaphysics of the Subject. In the wake of “end of philosophy,” the philosophical task is understood to be the inauguration of new thinking beyond metaphysics. In this context, Schelling has again come into prominence as someone who in the heyday of German Idealism has opened up the possibility of a philosophical thinking beyond the closure of the metaphysics of the Subject. The importance of Schelling for such post-metaphysical thinking is rightly emphasized by Martin Heidegger in his lecture on Schelling of 1936. In this manner Heidegger prepares the possibility of understanding Schelling’s works in an entirely different manner. Heidegger’s reading of Schelling in turn has immensely influenced the Post-Heideggerian French philosophical turn to the question of “the exit from metaphysics”. But this Post-Structuralist and deconstructive reading of Schelling is not the only reception of Schelling. Philosophers like Jürgen Habermas, whose doctorate work was on Schelling, would like to insist on the continuation of the philosophical project of modernity, and yet attempt to view reason beyond the instrumental functionality of reason at the service of domination and coercion. Schelling is seen from this perspective as a “post-metaphysical” thinker who has widened the concept of reason beyond its self-grounding projection. During the last half of the last century, Schelling’s works have tremendously influenced the post-Subject oriented philosophical discourses. During recent times, Schelling scholarship has remarkably increased both in the Anglo-American context and the Continental philosophical context.

Life
Philosophy
Influences
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life

Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph Schelling was born on 27 January, 1775 in Leonberg, Germany. His father was Joseph Friedrich Schelling and mother was Gottliebin Maria Cless. In 1785 Schelling attended the Latin School in Nürtingen. A precocious child, his teachers soon found nothing more to teach him. In 1790, Schelling joined the Tübingenstift, a Protestant Seminary, in Tübingen where he befriended Hölderlin who was later to become a great German poet, and Hegel who was to become a great philosopher. In 1794 Schelling published Über die Möglichkeit einer Form der Philosophie Überhaupt, in the same year of the publication of Fichte’s Wissenshaftlehre. Fichte’s Wissenshaftlehre, along with Kant’s Critique of Judgment that was published four years before (1790), proved to be of decisive importance for Schelling’s early philosophical career. In 1798 at the age of just 23, Schelling was called to a professorship at the University of Jena where he came in contact with German Romantic poets and philosophers like the Schlegel brothers and Novalis. He also met August Wilhelm Schlegel’s wife Caroline Schlegel and there begun one of the most fascinating and scandalous romantic stories of that time, leading to Caroline’s divorce and her marriage to Schelling in 1803. In 1803 he left Jena for Würzburg where he was called to a professorship. In the Autumn of 1805 Würzburg fell to Austria. The following year Schelling left for Munich where he was to stay till 1841 apart from a break between 1820-1827 when he lived in Erlangen. In 1809 Schelling published his great treatise on human freedom, Philosophical Inquiries Concerning the Nature of Human Freedom. A few months later Caroline died.. Schelling was devastated. In 1812 Schelling married Pauline who was to remain his life long companion. In 1831 Hegel died. In 1840 Schelling was called upon to the now vacant chair in Berlin to replace Hegel where he sought to elaborate his Positivphilosophie which was attended by the likes of Søren Kierkegaard, Alexander Humboldt, Bakunin and Engels. In 1854 on 20 August Schelling died at the age of 79 in Bad Ragaz, Switzerland.

2. Philosophy

Encounter with the works of Schelling often baffles the scholars and historians of philosophy. Schelling’s works seem to exhibit the lack of consistent development or systematic completion which most of his contemporaries possess. As a result scholars and historians of philosophy complain of the absence of a “single” Schelling. Recent scholarship, however, while accepting the often disruptive and discontinuous movement with which Schelling’s thinking moves that defies and un-works the completion of a single definite philosophical system, finds issues that are singular to Schelling’s continuous attention and unceasing concern. Thus the absence of a systematic completion is what has become the source of fascination for recent Schelling scholarship. Schelling appears to be the mark that delineates the limit of the systematic task of philosophy, “the end of philosophy and the task of thinking” as Heidegger says. Prominent Schelling scholars like Manfred Frank and Andrew Bowie (1993) have, however, pointed out that Schelling had never abandoned the idea of ‘system’, although the idea of ‘system’ was no longer grounded on a restricted, narcissistic concept of reason as totalizing and self-grounding but as opening to that which cannot be thought in the concept.

For the sake of convenience we can roughly divide the philosophical career of Schelling into four stages:

a. Naturphilosophie and Transcendental Philosophy

b. Identity philosophy

c. The Middle period: Freedom essay and The Ages of the World

d. Positive Philosophy (Philosophy of Mythology and Philosophy of Revelation)

a. Naturphilosophie and Transcendental Philosophy

The significance of Schelling’s early philosophical works lies in its radically new understanding of nature that departs significantly from the then dominant philosophical and scientific understanding of nature. Perhaps the best the way to approach the Schelling of Naturphilosophie is to see him, on the one hand, in relation to the dominant mechanistic determination of nature at that time, that of the Newtonian mathematical determination of nature according to which nature follows certain determinable physical laws of motion and rest, and that can be grasped in the objective cognition that has universal and non-relative validity and on the other hand, as a development of post-Kantian philosophy that led to a radical revision of Kant himself. Schelling’s philosophy of nature thus arose out of the demand to respond to the mechanistic determination of nature that was dominant at that time on the one hand, and to respond to the problems that arose in Kant’s division of the phenomenal realm of nature and noumenal realm of freedom. This demanded a dynamic philosophical account of nature where nature is no longer seen as a totality of objects that are a mere inert, opaque mass, but nature that is subjected to universal laws of causality. Such a dynamic philosophy of nature must be able to resolve the abyss that is opened up in the wake of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason. It is the abyss between the deterministic, causal, conditioned realm of understanding on the one hand, and the unconditioned realm of ethical self-determination on the other hand, between theoretical philosophy and practical philosophy. The task that the Post-Kantian philosophy has given to itself is to bridge this gap between the conceptual, constitutive realm of nature which can be grasped by causal laws that has universal validity, and the ethical spontaneity of the practical reason where the ethical subject is beyond the conditioned realm of determination and is thus a free Subject of self-determination. This Subject is the Subject of freedom that cannot be grounded in the constitutive principles of understanding but in the regulative Ideas of reason. J. G Fichte sought to unify the theoretical reason (that is “understanding”) and the practical reason by grounding them both in the dynamic activity of the self-consciousness that posits itself as pure, unconditioned act of self-positing ‘I’. The task of accounting for the process of emergence of the world of nature, which is thus a dynamic process, is addressed by Fichte thus: nature is an essential self-limitation of the ‘I’. The unconditioned, infinite self-positing ‘I’, in order to know itself as itself, divides itself into the finite ‘I’ and its counter-movement “Not-I”. In this manner, Fichte claimed to have resolved the problem that appeared to him and to the post-Kantian philosophers as that which is left unresolved by Kant himself. This is the question of how to account for the mysterious X, “the thing-in-itself” which, according to Kant, can never be grounded in the constitutive principle of understanding. As the condition of possibility of knowledge, “the thing-in-itself” can never be known. It is irreducible to the concepts of understanding. Fichte in his Science of Knowledge accounts for the genesis of this “thing-in-itself” in the pure self-positing act of the ‘I’. Since the ‘I’ cannot be an object of outer sense like any other objects of cognition ( Kant prohibits this), ‘I’ can only emerge in a pure, primordial act of inner-self. This self-emerging ‘I’ cannot therefore be an object of conceptual cognition, of an empirical intuition. It can only be grasped in the inner sense in ‘intellectual intuition’ which is none but ‘the fact of self-consciousness.’ According to Fichte, ‘the thing-in-itself’ is this self-emerging self-consciousness which is a ‘fact’ unlike any other ‘fact’. It is a fact that only ‘intellectual intuition’ grasps in the act of pure self-intuition. This is because only a being capable of intuiting itself as simultaneously representing and represented can account for the unity of representation and object. For such a being, that is ‘I’, there is no other predicate than itself. It is its own object. This object for it appears as nature which is the self-limitation of the self-positing Subject. Fichte’s idealism later came to be known as Subjective Idealism.

Schelling’s early works flourished under the influence of Fichte’s thinking. In 1797 Schelling published an essay called Treatise Explicatory of the Idealism in the “Science of Knowledge” in Philosophisches Journal edited by Immanuel Niethammer. This essay is crucial document for understanding the transition from Kantian critical philosophy to German Idealism. While attempting to elucidate what Kant would have intended if Kant’s philosophy is to prove internally cohesive, Schelling moves to the task of unifying theoretical and practical philosophy in a single principle in such a manner that he actually moves beyond both Kantian and Fichtean philosophy. What allows this unification of theoretical and practical philosophy is the Spirit’s infinite striving to represent the universe. The Spirit is not a static entity given, something mysterious X, but infinite becoming and infinite productivity. It is in this ceaseless production lies the organic nature of human Spirit that is moved by its immanent laws and that has its purposive-ness within itself. Schelling here introduces the notion of organism which unites in its immanence its goal and purpose, its form and matter, concept and intuition. As such each organism is a system which is “an arabesque delineation of the soul” or “eternal archetype” that finds expression in every plant. As immanent unity of form and matter that orients itself towards absolute purposive-ness through successive stages, this organism is not thus mere static, lifeless entity but is said to exhibit life. The Idealist notion of the system here takes this unified world of organism as model. Intuition is the unity of form and matter, representation and object which is distinguishable only in the concept that freely repeats the originary unity. With the help of the schematic power of the imagination, concept here produces the individual object of cognition. The succession of representation occurs alternately in a circle. To move beyond this circle of theoretical knowledge, this circle where the object always returns, it is necessary to introduce an act of free self-determination which cannot be further determined. This act is the absolute act of free will which is primordial and infinite. It is with this act the theoretical and practical philosophy is united.

In the same year Schelling published his Naturphilosophie that further elaborates the concept of organism through analysis of natural phenomena with the help of scientific studies of the day. This work responds to the dual tasks mentioned above. On the one hand it must give an account of a dynamic process of the emergence of nature as against the mechanistic, deterministic understanding of nature; and on the other hand, to resolve the problem left by Kant, that of bridging the realm of theoretical and practical philosophy by developing a dynamic philosophy of nature that takes into account Fichtean dialectical philosophy of consciousness. Like the Treatise of the same year, this new philosophy of nature is not grounded in the self-positing, unconditioned self-consciousness but by positing a “non-objective”, unconditioned in nature itself which Schelling calls “productivity”. It is this productivity that emerges through the logic of polar oppositions between subject and object that is shown to lead to a higher subject-object synthesis. For Schelling such a dialectical logic is deducted as a movement of potencies. The first potency is the movement of infinite to the finite. The second potency makes the reverse movement, while the third potency alone, which is higher than the other two, unities preceding potencies. In this manner Schelling explains magnetism as the first potency, electricity as the second and chemistry as the third potency that dialectically sublates the other two. Schelling’s philosophy of nature that attempts to develop the dynamic process of Idealism from the objective side can be seen as a parallel development to the Subjective Idealism that is elaborated by Fichte.

In the Treatise Explicatory of the Idealism in the “Science of Knowledge” of 1797 Schelling hints at the idea of “the history of self-consciousness”. The Spirit through its originary activity presents the infinite in the finite, a movement whose goal is self-consciousness that marks the unification of theoretical and practical philosophy, nature and history. Schelling perfects this model in his System of Transcendenatl Idealism. Schelling’s publication of The System of Transcendental Idealism in 1800 brought immediate fame to the young 25 year old philosopher. Schelling here draws from Fichte’s great insight that self-consciousness is not a mere “given entity”. It is not an unknown and inaccessible X, a mysterious transcendental “in-itself” as the formal ground of cognition, but a coming into presence of itself, a pure self-positing emergence through the dialectical process of self-positing and self-limitation. In that way a “history of self-consciousness” can be deduced from one principle that explains the coming into being of the theoretical cognition that at its limit passes into the practical realm of freedom, that is, the objective world of history . This is the task of Schelling’s System of Transcendental Idealism of 1800. Thus the axiomatic sense of Fichtean I=I is transformed into the dynamic deduction of the self-consciousness by one principle. This is emergence of the Idealist notion of System whose possibility, according to the Idealists, is already given in Kantian Critical philosophy; a possibility is denied by Kant himself.

“The history of self-consciousness” comes into being in three stages or epochs. While the first epoch manifests the coming into being of “productive intuition” from “original sensation” and the second epoch manifests the emergence of “reflection” from “productive intuition”, the third epoch recounts the emergence of “the absolute act of will” from “reflection”. At the end of the third epoch, “the history of self-consciousness” passes into the practical realm where the deduction of the concept of history is shown to be the realm of unity of freedom and necessity. This has led Schelling to ask at the end of System: how the Subject which is now a completed self-consciousness can become conscious of that moment of its origin which is now unconscious for it, a past that appears to have receded into an immemorial origin and is inaccessible? It now appears that the condition of possibility of consciousness as such remains irreducible to consciousness itself. This is the problem that has become decisive, not only for Schelling’s subsequent philosophical career, but for the fate of Idealism as such. It now appears as if our self-consciousness is driven or constituted by an unconscious ground, forever inaccessible to consciousness, which can never be grounded in consciousness itself.

For Schelling this shows the limit of philosophical cognition and at the same time the importance of works of art. By refusing the claim to say or represent the synthesis of unconscious and conscious, the work of art rather shows it. Therefore art can be said to be the “the eternal organ and document of philosophy” whose basic character is an “unconscious infinity” that arises in the work of art’s synthesis of nature and freedom. While the artist initiates a work of art with a manifest, conscious intention, she, in an unconscious and unintentional manner, depicts infinity without representing or saying it. Such an unintentional showing exceeds the representational acts of consciousness. It cannot be reduced to categorical statements. Therefore works of art cannot be understood on the basis of pre-given set of rules. Works of art are not exhausted in the normative or axiomatic definitions as to ‘what constitutes art as such’. What constitutes the ‘essence’ of art lies rather in its excess of showing over the said. In that sense works of art are more analogous with organisms by virtue of its existing as a link between unconsciousness and consciousness. Such a link can only be shown and therefore remains irreducible to the propositional character of judgment. Schelling develops such insights further in his lectures on The Philosophy of Art (1802), two years after The System of Transcendental Idealism . Unlike Hegel’s lectures on Aesthetics where Hegel argues that “the work of art is a thing of the past” in so far as it no longer has an essential relation to the Absolute even though works of art will continue to be produced, and thus pass into the sobriety of philosophy’s Absolute Knowledge, Schelling sees works of art and philosophy as manifesting the differential mode of the Absolute where art retains an essential, singular and irreducible role.

b. Identity Philosophy

In 1795, Friedrich Hölderlin published an article called On Judgment and Being that has proved to be of decisive importance for the later development of German Idealism. In this small article Hölderlin attempts to think of an Absolute identity, a prior and originary ground of consciousness that cannot be grasped or known within the immanence of self-consciousness. Hölderlin calls this originary identity “being”( Seyn) which he distinguishes from Judgment ( das Urteil). Hölderlin here attempts to think of an originary identity that grounds the reflective judgment. According to Hölderlin this reflective judgment which is the unity of a disjunction, separation or difference between the subject and the object, must already presuppose an originary identity before judgment. In so far as judgment presupposes the difference between the subject and the object of consciousness, it must already be grounded in an identity. This identity is being (Seyn) which, because of its ground character, remains irreducible to the reflective consciousness. In order for judgment to be possible, it must be grounded in a principle that exceeds judgment itself. This originary identity is being which is before or without consciousness.

In his Identity philosophy, Schelling too attempts to move beyond the immanence of self-consciousness and the circle of reflective judgment. With this move, Schelling decisively breaks away from the Fichtean subjective Idealism. The question of ‘I’ is no longer the point of departure, unlike that of Fichte’s absolute ‘I’ that is not an inert substance but arises purely in the act of self-positing. Rather, here it is the question of consciousness as a result of a process which is to be grasped not merely from the side of the Subject of self-consciousness but from the other side as well. This relation between subject and object thus can no longer be grounded within self-consciousness itself but in an absolute indifference that is prior to this distinction and hence, that can only be presupposed but is never accessible to reflective judgment or to the categories of understanding. Unlike that of reflective philosophy, the question is no longer that of making a correspondence between the subject and the object of consciousness. Such a representational philosophy of correspondence is here abandoned. The problem is rather that of explaining the manifestation of a finite world from a ground that is forever excluded from the infinite chain of conditioned, finite, particular entities. In order not to fall into dualism, which Jacobi alludes is the dualism between the unconditioned ground on the one hand and the infinite chain of conditioned, finite entities on the other, Schelling has to explain the manifestation of the finite world out of its unconditioned ground, from an absolute indifference, without falling into the logic of reflective thinking which Hegel later uses to develop in his Phenomenology of Spirit. This is the emergence of the finite world of entities that are connected to each other in an infinite chain of predicates from an originary indifference which is unconditioned. This emergence is not a smooth transition but a qualitative leap, a diversion, a falling away (Abfall) from its originary ground. Later in his critique of Hegel, Schelling argues that such a leap cannot be understood on the basis of Hegelian modality of dialectical negativity that arrives at absolute knowledge only on the basis of the self-cancellation of the finite.

Perhaps the most lucid and systematic exposition of Schelling Identity philosophy will be found in his posthumously published lecture called The System of Philosophy in General and of the Philosophy of Nature in Particular (1804). Schelling gave this lecture during his brief years of stay at Würzburg. Schelling here begins with the proposition which according to him is the first presupposition of all knowledge, that is: “the knower and that which is known are the same”. This proposition immediately puts into question the correspondence theory of truth and knowledge that was dominant at that time. The correspondence theory of knowledge posits two principles – the subject and the object of knowledge – which are then sought to be reconciled in a higher synthetic principle. According to Schelling, once this dualism is posited, the possibility of knowledge itself becomes inexplicable. Therefore Schelling begins with an absolute identity of the known and the knower, an identity that cannot be posited within subjectivity. With this notion of absolute identity beyond subjectivity, Schelling definitely breaks with Fichte’s Subjective Idealism and Kant’s reflective philosophy. Distinguishing his Identitätssystem from both Empiricism and merely subjective Idealism, Schelling here introduces the notion of the Absolute that has proved to be of crucial importance for German Idealism in general. The absolute identity is the unconditional identity of the subject and the object, idea and Being, Ideal and Real both at once, immediately posited and not discreetly. As immediate knowledge of the absolute, this system of identity is distinguished from what Schelling calls “common sense understanding”.

The common sense understanding distinguishes conditional knowledge, which is synthetic, real knowledge from unconditional knowledge, which is analytic and thus is no real knowledge. Here common sense understanding comes to an irresolvable aporia: either I have real, objective knowledge, but then I renounce the unconditional; or, I have the unconditional in which case it is merely subjective and thus is no real knowledge. According to Schelling, this irresolvable aporia is the aporia of Kantian philosophy which Kantian dogmatism can never resolve. This demands a move beyond Kant’s critical philosophy. This move which inaugurates German Idealism consists of going beyond the mediated knowledge of the Absolute to the immediate knowledge of the Absolute which is an immediate affirmation of this affirmation. As immediate knowledge of the absolute, Reason is Absolute Knowledge. From this idea Hegel’s notion of the Absolute is not far. Unlike Kant’s regulative idea of Reason, Reason here is the idea of God as an immediate, absolute, unconditional identity. The immediate awareness of the Spirit of its absolute will which can never be further grounded in concept, is what Schelling calls in this essay ‘intellectual intuition’. It is intuition because it is not yet mediated by concept, and it is intellectual because it goes beyond the empirical in that it has as its predicate its self-affirmation. As the unconditional ground of all knowledge, ‘intellectual intuition’ does not belong even to inner sense. Thus what Fichte calls ‘intellectual intuition’ is no longer seen here as belonging to the inner sense but to the unconditional absolute which is beyond the circle of self-consciousness. “The fact of consciousness” is not originary, for there must already be a priori identity before differences come to manifest in consciousness. The essence of Reason can be said to be ‘intellectual intuition’ whose object is exclusively the absolute which is monolithic, one and only substance. By virtue of this affirmation, Reason recognizes “the eternal impossibility of non-being”. Being is not a predicate of God as something lying outside or exterior, but God and being is immediately, unconditionally one without duration. This absolute identity is infinite by virtue of its idea. Therefore God can neither be thought as the end result of the self-negation of difference, nor being involved in a process of emanation. The indivisibility and univocity of God is neither a numerical concept nor a concept of totality as aggregate unity of finite particulars. This is because the indivisibility and univocity of God is the ground for infinite divisibility in form or in accidents. How can the existence of finite, particulars be explained within Identitätssystem?

In regard to the absolute identity, these finite, particulars are surely non-being, non-ens, non-essentials that can neither subtract nor add anything to the essence of the being who is the absolute substance. The existence of the finite, particulars can only be understood, not as modification of essence, but as modifications in form. They are non-being in respect to the universal which is absolute identity, but considered independently, they are not completely devoid of being. They are in part being and in part non-being. As such they are “real” or “concrete” things, irreducibly finite, particular, multiple, whose ground of existence does not lie within themselves but in that absolute identity of Being and essence. Schelling here deduces the finitude of particulars which ‘common sense understanding’ calls ‘actuality’, not as a process of emanation from the absolute identity, but as negativity that adheres in all finite things. Since these finite things cannot have positivity of being within themselves, they must therefore always relate themselves to other finite things, all sensuous cognition of them can only be non-cognition. Schelling here radically departs from Kant. For Kant all cognition is cognition of the sensible but not of the supersensible. By contrast Schelling argues that all of our sensory knowledge is only a privation of knowledge, or rather, “a negation of knowledge”. Hegel argues in a similar manner in Phenomenology of Spirit (1807) where he shows in a dialectical manner, the vanity of the supposed certitude of sensuous cognition.

One can present the schema of Schelling’s Identitätssystem as follows. God as absolute identity is an essential, qualitative identity. Absolute indifference follows from this essential identity of the absolute. Therefore, absolute indifference is not in-itself essential but a quantitative identity. There is thus a difference between absolute identity and absolute indifference. The opposition between real and ideal, subject and object arises out of this indifference. This is the birth of the finite world. Schelling here introduces the theory of potencies in triplicates that are “the necessary modes of appearances of the real and ideal universes”. While the potencies in triplicates are “the necessary modes of appearances” of the finite universes, they are not applicable to the absolute identity. The absolute identity is thus without potency or devoid of power. The potencies are those modes of appearances that make manifest the non-essential. Therefore they all have equal dignity in relation to the absolute. No potency has priority over the others temporally, for they are not posited successively in a genetic sequence but simultaneously, with equal primordiality. As such, they constitute a circle where all the potencies are posited together but not in an equal manner. Each time the potencies are posited, a particular potency predominates, subjugating the others to their relative non-being. At another time another potency predominates in an alternate manner, always returning to the same and always going away, always being attracted and repulsed, always contracted and expanded in an alternate, circular manner. In this alternating, rotatory movement of potencies the Real principle comes first as the ground or condition of the Ideal Universe. The Ideal universe then overcomes the Real principle, its conditioning and grounding factor, by relegating it to its relative non-being. Only the higher synthetic principle can unify both the Real and Ideal universes by inhering in both and yet separating each from the other. Schelling presents the theory of potency in the following formula:

—————–

A2 = (A=B)

Where:

A=B : The domination of the Real or affirmed. It is A1

A2 : The domination of the Ideal

A3 : Indifference between the other two

With the theory of potencies Schelling explains the existence of the finite universes which are originally one. Their existence is neither completely being nor nothing, but a relative being and relative non-being. As relative being and relative non-being, potencies exceed each time from the immanence of self-presence. They never arrive at the absolute equilibrium of forces without ceasing themselves to be potencies. The circle of the potencies never comes to standstill, or that they do not come out of the circle unless a will superior to this circle of the conditioned existence breaks in.

Three years after this lecture, Hegel published his magnum opus Phenomenology of Spirit. In his Phenomenology of Spirit published in 1807, Hegel apparently criticizes Schelling’s notion of the Absolute indifference as “the night where all cows are black”. In a letter to Hegel, Schelling asks Hegel to clarify in the Preface to the Phenomenology whether this criticism is applied to him or to others who misuse Schelling’s ideas. Hegel did not incorporate this clarification in the subsequent edition of Phenomenology that the criticism is applied, not to Schelling, but to others. This led to the break in the friendship between the two philosophers who shared the same room at Tübingenstift. While this friendship was profoundly important and fruitful for both of them, the bitterness proved to be equally decisive for the development of their singular modes of thinking, one leading to the task of systematic completion of the metaphysics of the Subject, the other leading to the attempt to inaugurate a new thinking beyond such a metaphysics of the Subject.

c. The Middle period

Published in 1809, Philosophical Inquiries into the Nature of Human Freedom is perhaps the most important book that Schelling published in his life time. Along with Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit, Fichte’s Science of Knowledge, and Kant’s Critique of Judgment, this essay is one of the greatest philosophical achievements of the late 18^th and 19^th century Germany. Published immediately before the death of Caroline, it evokes “a deep, unappeasable melancholy” that adheres to all finite beings. Here Schelling does not pose the question concerning the essence of human freedom as the dialectical problem between nature and freedom. Freedom does not appear here as the free exercise of the rational Subject’s will to mastery over its sensuous nature, but as the capacity to do evil. The question thus posed is no longer one question amongst others but the metaphysical question concerning the possibility of a system of freedom. On the one hand, freedom appears to be that which cannot be included within a system at all; on the other hand, the demand of Idealism that there must be a system without which nothing is adequately comprehensible is not to be renounced. The essay attempts to reconcile these two incommensurable demands: the demand of the unconditionality of freedom that grounds being and the demand of the grounding act of the system. This attempt at the system of freedom arose in the wake of what came to be known as the “pantheism controversy”.

The pantheism controversy is centred on the supposedly atheistic figure of Spinoza. During the late 18^th century, and early 19^th century, the dominant understanding of Spinoza was that of a pantheist and consequently an atheist. It is understood that within the pantheistic system of Spinoza’s ethics wherein God is immediately identified with the world, there is no place for the affirmation of God as unconditional reality. If the world is only a totality of conditioned, finite beings, then the unconditioned existence of God cannot be understood to be immediately identifiable with the world, and consequently with any dogmatic, rational system. In the famous pantheism controversy, Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi attempted to show that a system of rational knowledge never arrives at the unconditioned since, for such a system, the unconditioned can only arise as a result of a process where the one conditioned leads to other conditioned in an infinite chain of negativity. To be properly concerned with the unconditioned, one must begin with the unconditioned itself which no rational knowledge ever attains. For Jacobi it is only the leap of faith beyond the system of rational knowledge that enables us to open to the unconditionality of the absolute being. Therefore all system of rational knowledge for Jacobi is nihilism. Jacobi thereby becomes the first to use the word “nihilism” that arose in the context of the pantheism controversy.

Schelling here agrees with Jacobi about the limit of purely rational attainment of the unconditioned. Schelling, however, disagrees with Jacobi’s use of a limited and restricted notion of ‘system’ and ‘freedom’, along with Jacobi’s restricted use of the metaphysical and logical notion of judgment. In the Freedom essay Schelling attempts to re-interpret the logical and metaphysical notion of judgment in such a manner that it opens up to the unconditioned character of freedom without renouncing the demand of a system. Such a system must, on the one hand, be other than a purely formal, lifeless realism of Spinoza; and on the other hand, it must be otherwise than a conventional system of idealism that reduces the dynamic character of freedom and the world into pure rational necessity. Only a dynamic notion of the system that affirms the exuberance of life and the generosity of freedom can truly be system. The formal, rational notion of freedom as the intelligible principle that overcomes sensuous impulses must be opened to the ontological question of the beings in their becoming. The question of judgment is thus no longer merely a formal logical question but the question of the jointure, or bond of beings. This bond or jointure of beings is grounded in freedom which, understood in more originary manner, is not arbitrary free will but that belongs together with highest necessity. This jointure of beings – the infinite, creative being of God and the finite, created being called ‘man’ – must be essentially a free relation, a relation that is governed by freedom which in the highest sense is also necessity. If man is free in a certain manner, then this manner is also the manner of man’s individuation. This is to say that to the extent that man is individuated by freedom, man’s freedom is distinguishable from the absolute freedom of the infinite, eternal being called God. This peculiar essence of human freedom is the capacity to do evil.

According to Schelling, the human is distinguished from the eternal creative God by the specificity of his freedom which is essentially and inextricably a finite freedom. God is the being whose condition, though never completely immanent, can be actualized in its very existing. On the other hand, the finite being can never actualize itself completely because the ground of its existence remains inappropriable. This is the source of the fundamental melancholy of all finite beings. The distinction between the absolute freedom of the eternal being and the finite freedom of the mortal can be better understood with the help of Schelling’s distinction between the ground of existence and existence itself. This is not a formal distinction between sensuous nature and intelligible will, but a dynamic distinction of freedom. Eternal or finite, each being is a jointure of the ground of existence and existence itself. In the eternal, creative being, this jointure is indissoluble. In the mortal, however, there can occur dissolution of this jointure. It is the possibility of the dissolution of the principles that explains the finitude of the finite being, and the freedom of this finite being. The human is essentially finite being, and only such a finite being is capable of evil. Therefore evil is neither divine nor beastly but essentially belongs to the human freedom. Evil has this peculiar, specific relation to human finitude. Unlike the beasts in whom the jointure of the principles is governed by necessity, and unlike the divine in whom the jointure of the principles is indissoluble, human freedom partakes of the divine freedom and is yet separated by an abyss. According to Schelling, this abyss is the possibility of dissolution of the principles.

In the dynamic freedom there are two oppositional principles that never reach equilibrium. In the coming to existence of the finite being there adhere these oppositional principles. There is the dark principle which is the principle of ground, and there is the ideal principle of light. The dark principle that operates in the realm of history as the principle of particularity is the principle of evil. Man is the finite being that unites in himself both of these principles in an equal measure. Since the nexus (band) of these principles in him is free and not governed by necessity, man is free to bring permutation to this nexus. Therefore what ought to remain as mere condition of existence, as mere principle of particularity, man can seek to elevate to totality or to universal domination. Out of this self-affirmation of the finite being who in this self-affirmation seeks to abnegate its very finitude, there arises evil. Thus while the possibility of evil is given to man in the coming into existence of this being, to actualize this principle of possibility is the work of human freedom. As mere ground, this principle is the very source of creative joy and affirmation of life, but elevating it into the universality or totality results into the most terrible form of evil that seeks to negate any form of its life-affirmative character. Thus the source of life and the origin of evil is grounded in the same principle. This principle is the human freedom whose origin remains unfathomable for man. According to Schelling, this unfathomable, inappropriable, unconditional freedom ought to remain inappropriable and unconditional, for the human creates a conditioned world on the basis of the unconditioned freedom. This conditioned world is history. By beginning this new “covenant”, man partakes the creativity of the divine freedom. This is the source of creative joy for the human, for through this creative act of human, the world of nature is redeemed. But in his vain arrogance and in his self-affirmation that is pushed to the point of absolutization and totalization, the human seeks to negate the finite character of his freedom and thereby seeks to elevate the principle of particularity to the universal domination. Herein lays the evil when the non-being, which is for that matter is not completely devoid of being, seeks to attain the complete, absolute being. Evil is therefore neither being nor nothing, but non-being’s malicious hunger for being. Therefore power of evil cannot be said to be the power of being. It is rather the power of non-being that seeks to devour itself and is never satisfied at any point, because it never reaches being without a remainder of non-being. More it does not reach being, more self-consuming becomes its lust. According to Schelling such is the character of evil.

In The Ages of the World which was written between 1809-1827 and is found in various incomplete versions, Schelling develops a narrative method that seeks to recount the stages of the world’s becoming through the agonal movement of conflictual forces. This is the germ of Schelling’s theory of potencies. The world as it exists has its ground in a dark, unfathomable past which no work of human reason can ever elevate into thought. This non-reason is not irrationality that is opposed to reason nor is it the negation of the possibility of reason but the ground of reason. Human reason thus exists only as a “regulated madness”. On account of its immanent force alone the human reason cannot attain the unconditioned which is the realm of absolute freedom. The emergence of the world-order is not seen as an immanent order ruled by the necessary principles of reason but has its source in an absolute, unconditional freedom. This freedom can arrive to the finite, mortal being as a gift. Man can never master this gift, because it opens man to his historicity. The essence of history is freedom. “The ages of the world” thus arises out of the unconditional character of freedom. This principle of freedom manifests itself in the agonal movement of contradictory forces, one repulsive and the other attractive. It is this agonal movement of oppositional forces that makes possible the emergence of “the ages of the world” out of the unconditional. This unconditional is that which cannot be further grounded in thought or in self-consciousness, it is what Schelling in his Freedom essay calls “the indivisible remainder” that constantly solicits from finite human beings ‘awe’ or ‘respect’.

Here as elsewhere Schelling’s thought wrestles with the question of the unconditioned. If there is anything that is singular to Schelling’s whole of philosophy, and that unifies Schelling’s often discontinuous philosophical career, it is this question of the unconditioned. Schelling does not explain the existence of the world with the help of logical categories. For Schelling, a rational system constitutive of logical categories cannot explicate the facticity or actuality of the world. It is the unconditional character of freedom whose ground is groundless (Abgrund), this freedom alone opens the world. Therefore there is always something excessive about freedom. In many texts, especially in his 1797 treatise, Schelling evokes a freedom which is not only a promise for the human but also a danger (Gefahr). “The ages of the world” is grounded by a condition which is excessive and unthinkable. The human belongs to the “un-pre-thinkable” ( Unvordenkliche). This is a promise as well as danger. Schelling evokes this excess to explain the possibility of the world and finite existence. This unconditional excess makes the world and being-in-the world as essentially finite and irreducibly mortal. It is this aspect of Schelling’s work that has most profoundly influenced the twentieth century philosophers like Franz Rosenzweig and Martin Heidegger.

d. Positive Philosophy

On 14 November 1831 Hegel died in Berlin. In 1840 Schelling was called to the now vacant chair in Berlin to replace Hegel. The following year Schelling began his lectures on “positive philosophy” (Positivphilosophie) which was attended by Kierkegaard, Bakunin, Humboldt and Engels. These lectures were delivered in three phases: Grounding of Positive Philosophy that introduces and grounds Positive Philosophy vis-à-vis the history of Negative Philosophy from Descartes onwards, followed by Philosophy of Mythology (Philosophie der Mythologie) and Philosophy of Revelation ( Philosophie der Offenbarung).

Schelling’s grounding of Positive Philosophy begins with the distinction between the “what” of being and “that being”. “What” of being is being as essence and “that” being is the contingent being’s pure actuality of existence. This actuality is not an attribute of being but its existentiality, the very facticity of its coming into being. From here comes the distinction between a negative philosophy, that is, the rational philosophy that is essentially concerned with the essence of being (its ‘what’ character) and the positive philosophy that is concerned with the pure actuality of the existence of “that” being which comes into its being. Such a being (“that” being) is not a settled entity that is given, but that which comes into being . Schelling calls such a coming into being, existence. Since this coming into being is not a finished entity but yet becoming and always contingent, it cannot be grasped in the concept. Therefore existence and movement cannot be a logical category. There is a concept only if a being already exists, for by definition concept can only grasp the essence of being which in turn is possible if such a being already exists. Understood in this sense, negative philosophy is not concerned with the facticity of something that exists at all. Therefore it is not concerned with the question “why something exists at all?” The negative philosophy is rather concerned with the question: if and if something exists, what is its essence, what is the “being” character of this being irrespective of the problem whether such a being exists as “this” being at all.

For example, when Kant argues against the ontological proof of God, he argues neither for the existence of God nor for its non-existence. He only argues that the concept of God is not extendable to the existence of God because ‘existence’ cannot be predicated. In so far as ‘existence’ cannot be predicated, its actuality or facticity can only be for rational philosophy a presupposition. This presupposition is a point of beginning whose existence can only be deduced only if such an existence is already granted; only if such and such a being has already revealed itself. What then Kant’s philosophy shows, for Schelling, is the limit of negative philosophy, a limit that constitutes the possibility of negative philosophy. Schelling does not contest the possibility of negative philosophy, but precisely demands it however, on the condition that it recognizes this limit that is constitutive of it and does not pretend to be able to constitute itself as absolute system that includes the concept as well as existence of being. What Schelling finds problematic in Hegel is not that there should not be negative philosophy, but of Hegel’s claim to include existence in a system that is logical and purely negative system. For Schelling, Hegel’s extension of his negative notion of system to the Absolute totality without outside is without justification. For Schelling there always remains a remainder of such a system of negativity, which is the positivity of existence. Hegel’s system is founded upon purely negative relation of the finite being in relation to other finite beings where the unconditioned is supposed to be reached as a self-negation of negation. According to this conception, the unconditioned is the end result of a process of the self-cancellation of finite, conditioned entities. As early as 1804 in a lecture in Würzburg on The System of Philosophy in General Schelling contests this idea of the absolute as the end result of a process of the self-negation of finitude. According to Schelling, such a system is based upon a false premise and a presupposition. It presupposes to have reached the unity of being and thought, while it reaches such a unity merely in thought that means, only from negative side. It leaves out the pure actuality of existence whose unconditional character of its being cannot be merely the result of a dialectical process of the self-cancellation of finitude. Unlike Hegel’s claim, a purely negative philosophy cannot be presupposition-less. It presupposes what it cannot incorporate within its systemic edifice. This limitation of negative philosophy demands a positive philosophy that begins with the unconditionality of existence, with a prius whose existence can only be proved posteriori once there is a manifest world. Schelling called such a positive philosophy, “metaphysical Empiricism”. Hence the idea of a positive philosophy is where the ground is a presupposition. This presupposition is the unconditional existence of being whose pure actuality no rational knowledge based upon potentiality can ever attain. While the philosophical concept that is essentially concerned with essence can only elaborate the possibility of being, the actuality of being itself is beyond such categorical cognition, for the existence of this being exists as absolute freedom and not as a necessary consequence of a concept.

Here the limit of the Idealist notion of system is reached. Schelling in these lectures shows that the (Hegelian ) notion of the Subject presupposes as its condition that which cannot be further grounded in the Subject itself. One then has to begin from the pure actuality of existence, from a facticity, which is already always before self-consciousness and before thought’s ability to grasp it in the concept. This immemoriality of the origin is the “exuberance of being” that elicits from us awe or respect ( Achtung), because it exposes us to the Infinite that unconditionally and groundlessly exists. It thereby exposes us to our own finitude and mortality.

3. Influences

How deeply Schelling’s later philosophy has influenced Kierkegaard cannot be shown by quoting Kierkegaard or from Kierkegaard’s self-understanding. This can better be shown by understanding Kierkegaard’s anti-systematic notions of “existence”, “temporality” and “finitude” that he understands to be irreducible to the general order of the system. Like Schelling, Kierkegaard understands the question of existence as the highest question of philosophy. There is in existence something that cannot be grasped in the predicative. Likewise, in the realm of history there is a preponderant mass of contingencies that cannot be completely and exhaustively accounted by the speculative dialectical logic. The Post-Schellingian philosophies that are concerned with this problem have the source of their inspiration in Schelling’s later works. For Schelling neither history nor existence is a homogenous process leading straight, necessarily, to a telos of absolute knowledge by irresistible law which is auto-generative and anonymous. History is rather a field of polemos where agonal forces are at work. Kierkegaard’s The Concept of Anxiety begins with a Schellingian note. Kierkegaard here argues, in a manner that recalls Schelling’s critique of Hegel, that the notion of movement does not allow itself to be thought within the immanent speculative logic of Hegel, for the true movement presupposes transcendence which by definition a logical category cannot grasp. The task of Kierkegaard’s philosophy is to open towards an Archimedean point outside totality, or outside the general, normative order of validity. That point cannot be attained within the realm of the ethical, that is, within the homogenous order of universal norms, but in a “quantum leap” of faith. That leap of faith must pass through an existential experience of anxiety (Angst) which no phenomenology of spirit can thematize.

This anxiety has family resemblance with Schelling’s notion of anxiety of the mortal who constantly flees from the fire of the centre and takes shelter in the periphery. In Schelling as well as in Kierkegaard, especially in his Fear and Trembling, this anxiety manifests the irreducible finitude of the mortal being who is seized by the gaze of the wholly other, the divine, holding his hand, tearing him out of the totality of finite knowledge. In his Concluding Unscientific Postscript Kierkegaard attempts to open this universal order of the ethical to the notion of subjectivity, the subjectivity of that singular individual for whom transcendence of the wholly other is an existential interest. This existential interest, argues Kierkegaard, cannot be addressed within the immanent order of the system. One of the most prominent tendencies of the post-Schellingian philosophy is this question of existence from the religious point of view. For Schelling himself the question of religion remains irreducible to the rational-logical system of knowledge. The transcendence of the absolute cannot be reduced to a theodicy of history. As early as 1804, Schelling warned in his Philosophy and Religion against the danger of the acts of legitimacy by the earthly power in the name of the embodiment of the divine in the profane body. Religion for Schelling, as for Kierkegaard remains irreducible to the violence of a historical reason that constantly evokes a theological foundation for the justification of its domination. As against this theologico-political foundation, Kierkegaard evokes the whole other God. Thus religion cannot be used as the foundation of the profane in order to legitimize the power of earthly sovereignty, because religion essentially opens us to a non-foundation that eternally delegitimizes any earthly power, like the power of the State. In his 1804 lecture Philosophy and Religion and in his Stuttgart lectures of 1810, Schelling raises this important theologico-political question that has profound significance for our contemporary historical world. The recent upsurge of the question of political theology attempts to go back to Schelling to see how Schelling helps us to think of a critique of historical reason.

Such a question is pursued further by Franz Rosenzweig, a German Jewish philosopher who is contemporary of Martin Heidegger. Rosenzweig’s first scholarly work was his doctoral thesis on Hegel called Hegel and the State. In the wake of his horror of the First World War, Rosenzweig soon abandoned Hegelianism; his The Star of Redemption, which he wrote on post cards to his mother when he was in the Balkan Front, is an anti-Hegelian work. In this book, that evokes Schelling’s later works as one of the main sources of inspiration, Rosenzweig envisions the messianic notion of history and redemption beyond the closure of a historical-speculative reason. This remarkable book begins with the question of existence which he takes from Schelling’s later works. It is the notion of the individual, finite existence whose fear of death cannot be consoled by the concept of the universal history. This demands opening up the closure of the universal historical reason to the arrival of redemption that is always to come. This eternity which is always to come, that alone can redeem the violence of a historical reason, does not itself belong to the “Philosophy of the All”. Rosenzweig’s critique of “the philosophy of the All” begins with Schellingian critique of Hegel, that existence precedes thought and thus it cannot be enclosed within the All. It is what falls outside totality or system, and in this manner opens the world to the messianic event of pure future. The messianic arrival of eternity does not allow itself to be reduced to the theological foundation of the profane order, like the power of the State. Thus the State is no longer an expression of the Absolute. Like Schelling, Rosenzweig’s later works are deeply suspicious of the theodicy of history that legitimizes the political sovereignty of the State.

The question of existence is important for Martin Heidegger’s early philosophical works. What Heidegger calls in his early works “hermeneutics of facticity” has resonance with Schelling’s notion of actuality of “that”, the pre-predicative, pre-conceptual and pre-categorical disclosure. The existential analytic of Dasein that Heidegger elaborates in his Being and Time and his deconstruction of the metaphysical foundation of logic has inspiration in Schelling’s attempt to open the system of negative philosophy to the more originary revelation of being. Schelling’s positive philosophy seeks to release philosophy beyond its metaphysical foundation in the logic of the thinkable to a disclosure that can only be shown a posteriori . In this sense Schelling’s metaphysical empiricism is at once an exit from the metaphysics founded upon the notion of the predicative truth. What both Heidegger and Rosenzweig have sought to complete is this exit from metaphysics. Heidegger’s 1936 lecture on Schelling shows the real importance of Schelling’s thinking for him.

The exit from metaphysics is a fundamental problem even for Marx. Ernst Bloch, whom Jürgen Habermas calls “Schellingian Marxist”, combines a certain version of Marxism and messianism that envisions a utopian fulfilment oriented towards the “not yet”. His The Spirit of Utopia and his later work The Principle of Hope evoke a notion of history that is disruptive, opening to the “not yet”, a fundamental affirmation of future which Schelling always insisted as the very creative, free task of philosophy. While Schelling has attempted to open the radical notion of future in a certain eschatological-theological manner, Bloch’s messianism is essentially an atheistic eschatology.

Schelling’s influence is seen to be growing in our contemporary philosophical world. Thus Jean Louis Chrétien, the French philosopher, has drawn on Schelling from a certain phenomenological perspective. In his Unforgettable and the Unhoped for, Chrétien is concerned with the immemoriality of a promise that arrives from the extremity of time, from an eschatos of future always to come. Chrétien draws here on Schelling’s notion of the eternal past which has not come to pass but that is always a past, an immemorial past that, being the principle of foundation, always opens the world to its futurity. Schelling indeed develops such a notion of an immemorial past in his The Ages of the World. Like Schelling in his various texts, Chrétien too evokes Plato’s notion of Anamnesis as remembrance, not of what has passed, but what has immemorially opened us to truth. What has found us, the excess that opens us to the world, is immemorially lost. For both Schelling and Chrétien, this is not the occasion of despair but the occasion of a creative freedom and the possibility of future. In recent years the Anglophone philosophical world has been witnessing increased attention to Schelling’s works. This shows the continuing relevance of Schelling in our contemporary historical existence. Schelling’s philosophy has come to be interpreted and understood as a philosophy of affirmation and a philosophy of the exuberance of life as against petrified system of concepts. Jason Wirth’s recent work on Schelling rightly emphasizes the contemporaneity of Schelling for our concerns: our ethical concern with the primacy of Good over truth, the affirmation of life beyond the instrumental use of Reason, the affirmation of the more originary ecstatic temporality, and our deep ecological concerns. The ‘unconscious’ has psychoanalysis speaks of, evokes the notion of ‘unconscious’ in Schelling, the abyss that cannot be further grounded, and hence is unground. In Jacques Lacan’s term, it is the Real that never stops haunting, destabilizing and disturbing the symbolic order of the world. “The indivisible remainder” that Schelling speaks of in his 1809 Freedom essay is that element of eternal nature as ground that never ceases de-constituting the cultural-historical order of totality. The symbolic order of a restrictive Reason never reaches totality, but always opens to an eternal remnant outside. This question has profound importance of Schelling for our time.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph Schelling’s Sämmtliche Werke, ed. K.F.A. Schelling, I Abtheilung Vols. 1-10, II Abtheilung Vols. 1-4, Stuttgart: Cotta, 1856-61.
Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph von Schelling, Ausgewählte Schriften, 6 Vols., ed. Manfred Frank, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp 1985.
Aus Schellings Leben. In Briefen (three volumes), Adamant Media Corporations, 2003.
The Unconditional in Human Knowledge: Four early essays 1794-6 , trans. F. Marti, Lewisburg: Bucknell University Press, 1980.
Ideas for a Philosophy of Nature: as Introduction to the Study of this Science , trans. E.E. Harris and P. Heath with an introduction R. Stern, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1797/1988.
System of Transcendental Idealism, trans. P. Heath with an introduction by M. Vater, Charlottesville: University Press of Virginia, 1800/1978.
Bruno, or On the Natural and the Divine Principle of Things , trans. with an introduction by M. Vater, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1802/1984.
The Philosophy of Art , Minnesota: Minnesota University Press, 1802-03/1989.
On University Studies , trans. E.S. Morgan, ed. N. Guterman, Athens, Ohio: Ohio University Press, 1803/ 1966.
Philosophical Inquiries into the Nature of Human Freedom, trans. With an introduction by J. Gutmann, Chicago: Open Court, 1809/1936.
Clara : or On Nature’s Connection to the Spirit World, trans. Fiona Steinkamp, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1811/2002.
The Ages of the World, trans. Jason M. Wirth, Albany: State University of New York, 1811-15/2000.
The Ages of the World , trans. F. de W. Bolman, jr., New York: Columbia University Press, 1811-15/1967.
‘The Deities of Samothrace’ , trans. R.F. Brown, Missoula, Mont.: Scholars Press, 1815/1977.
On the History of Modern Philosophy, trans. Andrew. Bowie, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1833-4/1994.
Philosophie der Offenbarung . ed. M. Frank, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1841-2/1977.
Historical-Critical Introduction to the Philosophy of Mythology, trans. Richey, M., Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 2007.
The Grounding of Positive Philosophy: the Berlin Lectures , trans. Bruce Matthews, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 2008.
Philosophy and Religion , Spring Publications, 2010.
Idealism and the Endgame of Theory , trans. Thomas Pfau , Albany: State University of New York, 1994.
Philosophy of German Idealism: Fichte, Jacobi and Schelling, ed. Ernst Behler , Contuum, 1987.

b. Secondary Sources

Beach, Edward Allen, The Potencies of God(s): Schelling’s Philosophy of Mythology, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1994.
Behun, William A. The Historical Pivot: Philosophy of History in Hegel, Schelling and Hölderlin , Triad Press, 2006
Beiser, Frederick C., German Idealism: Struggle Against Subjectivism , Harvard: Harvard University Press, 2008.
Bowie, Andrew, Aesthetics and Subjectivity: from Kant to Nietzsche, Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1990.
Bowie, Andrew, Schelling and Modern European Philosophy: An Introduction, London: Routledge, 1993
Brown, Robert F., The Later Philosophy of Schelling: The Influence of Boehme in the Works of 1809-1815 , The Associated University Press, 1977
Courtine, Jean-Francois , Extase de la raison. Essais sur Schelling, Paris, Galilée, 1990
Distaso, Leonardo V., The Paradox of Existence : Philosophy and Aesthetics in the Young Schelling, Springer, 2010
Esposito, Josephe L., Schelling’s Idealism and Philosophy of Nature, Associated University Press, 1977
Fackenheim, Emil, The God Within: Kant, Schelling and Historicity , ed. John W. Burbridge, University of Toronto Press, 1996
Frank, Manfred, Der Unendliche Mangel an Sein, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1975
Frank, Manfred, Eine Einführung in Schellings Philosophie, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1985
Frank, Manfred, Selbstbewußtsein und Selbsterkenntnis, Stuttgart: Reclam, 1991
Frank, M. (ed). with Kurz, G., Materialien zu Schellings philosophischen Anfängen, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1975
Freydberg, Bernard, Schelling’s Dialogical Freedom Essay: Provocative Philosophy Then and Now , State University of New York Press, 2009
Geldhof, J, Revelation, Reason and Reality: Theological Encounters with Jaspers, Schelling and Baader, Peeters, 2007
Goudeli, Kyriaki, Challenges to German Idealism: Schelling, Fichte and Kant, Palgrave Macmillan, 2003
Grant, Ian Hamilton, Philosophies of Nature After Schelling, Continuum, 2008
Hegel, G.W. F., The Difference between Fichte’s and Schelling’s System of Philosophy, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1977
Heidegger, Martin, Schellings Abhandlung über das Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit, Tübingen: Niemeyer, 1971. Schelling’s Treatise on the Essence of Human Freedom, trans. Joan Stambaugh, Athens: Ohio University Press, 1985
Heidegger, Martin, Die Metaphysik des Deutschen Idealismus (Schelling), Frankfurt: Klostermann, 1991
Henrich, D. Selbstverhältnisse, Stuttgart: Reclam, 1982
Horn, Friedemann , Schelling and Swedenborg: Mysticism and German Idealism, trans. George F. Dole , Swedenborg Foundation Publishers, 1997
Jaspers, Karl, Schelling: Größe und Verhängnis, Munich: Piper, 1955
Kierkegaard, Søren, The Concept of Irony/Schelling Lecture Notes : Kierkegaard’s Writings Vol 2, Princeton University Press, 1992
Kosch, Michelle, Freedom and Reason in Kant, Schelling and Kierkegaard, Oxford University Press, 201
Lauer, Christopher, Suspension of Reason in Hegel and Schelling, Continuum,201
Limnatis, Nectarios G., German Idealism and the Problem of Knowledge: Kant, Fichte, Schelling and Hegel , Springer, 2010
Marx, W. , The Philosophy of F.W.J. Schelling: History, System, Freedom, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1984
Norman, Judith and Alistair Welchman , ed. New Schelling , Continuum, 2004
O’Meara, Thomas, Romantic Idealism and Roman Catholicism: Schelling and the Theologians, University of Notre Dame Press, 1982
Shaw, Davin Jane , Freedom and Nature in Schelling’s Philosophy of Art , Continuum, 2011
Snow, Dale E., Schelling and the End of Idealism, Albany: SUNY Press, 1996
Tillich, Paul, Mysticism and Guilt Consciousness in Schelling’s Philosophical Development , Bucknell University Press, 197
Tilliette, X. , Schelling une philosophie en devenir, Two Volumes, Paris: Vrin, 1970
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Author Information

Saitya Brata Das
Email: satyadx@yahoo.com
The University of Delhi
India

Feminist Standpoint Theory

Feminist standpoint theorists make three principal claims: (1) Knowledge is socially situated. (2) Marginalized groups are socially situated in ways that make it more possible for them to be aware of things and ask questions than it is for the non-marginalized. (3) Research, particularly that focused on power relations, should begin with the lives of the marginalized. Feminist standpoint theory, then, makes a contribution to epistemology, to methodological debates in the social and natural sciences, to philosophy of science, and to political activism. It has been one of the most influential and debated theories to emerge from second-wave feminist thinking. Feminist standpoint theories place relations between political and social power and knowledge center-stage. These theories are both descriptive and normative, describing and analyzing the causal effects of power structures on knowledge while also advocating a specific route for enquiry, a route that begins from standpoints emerging from shared political struggle within marginalized lives. Feminist standpoint theories emerged in the 1970s, in the first instance from Marxist feminist and feminist critical theoretical approaches within a range of social scientific disciplines. They thereby offer epistemological and methodological approaches that are specific to a variety of disciplinary frameworks, but share a commitment to acknowledging, analyzing and drawing on power/knowledge relationships, and on bringing about change which results in more just societies. Feminist scholars working within a number of disciplines—such as Dorothy Smith, Nancy Hartsock, Hilary Rose, Sandra Harding, Patricia Hill Collins, Alison Jaggar and Donna Haraway—have advocated taking women’s lived experiences, particularly experiences of (caring) work, as the beginning of scientific enquiry. Central to all these standpoint theories are feminist analyses and critiques of relations between material experience, power, and epistemology, and of the effects of power relations on the production of knowledge.

Introduction
Historical Roots of Feminist Standpoint Theory
Central Themes in Feminist Standpoint Theory
What is a Standpoint?
Acquiring Knowledge via Standpoints
The Outsider Within
Controversies
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

At first blush there appears a tension between the traditional epistemological assumption that a general, universal and abstract account of knowledge and scientific enquiry is possible, and the politically inflected feminist claim that such analyses are only properly understood in the social contexts in which they arise, and in terms of the biases and prejudices those contexts generate. From the outset, then, feminist epistemologies seem to be located within the contradictory pull of the politicized material and experiential concerns of feminism and the abstract universal concerns of epistemology. Feminist epistemological projects began as a critique of that tradition but have evolved beyond the critical to reframe and reconceptualize the problems of knowledge and the epistemological project itself. Feminist epistemology does not adopt a monolithic critical position with respect to a traditional canon of epistemological work; rather it consists of a variety of feminist epistemological approaches, of which feminist standpoint epistemologies form a strand.

Here feminist standpoint theory is examined primarily as a feminist epistemology and as a methodology for feminist researchers in the social sciences where, arguably, feminist standpoint theory has had the most influence and been the subject of most debate. As with feminist theories generally, it would be somewhat misleading to represent feminist standpoint theory as a single set of epistemological commitments or a single methodological approach. More appropriate would be to think of them in terms of ‘standpoint theories’. Nevertheless, standpoint theories share common commitments and approaches, which are taken as the focus here. Aspects of those theories that attract controversy both within and outside of the intellectual conversations in which feminist standpoint theories have been developed and employed are also briefly discussed.

2. Historical Roots of Feminist Standpoint Theory

The genealogy of feminist standpoint theory begins in Hegel’s account of the master/slave dialectic, and subsequently in Marx and, particularly, Lukacs’ development of the idea of the standpoint of the proletariat. Hegel argued that the oppressed slave can eventually reach a state of freedom of consciousness as a result of her/his realization of self-consciousness through struggles against the master, and via involvement through physical labor in projects that enable her/him to fashion the world—to affect it in various ways. Hegel’s analysis of the struggle inherent in the master/slave relationship gave rise to the insight that oppression and injustice are better analyzed and understood from the point of view of the slave than from that of the master. Marx and Engels, and, later, Lukacs developed this Hegelian idea within the framework of the dialectic of class consciousness, thereby giving rise to the notion of a standpoint of the proletariat (the producers of capital) as an epistemic position that, it was argued, provided a superior starting point for understanding and eventually changing the world than that of the controllers and owners of capital. The Hegelian and Marxist traditions, then, provide the genesis of standpoint theorists’ claim that the ‘double vision’ afforded to those who experience social relations from a position of marginality can, under certain circumstances, offer them epistemic advantage.

Although their genealogy begins in the Hegelian and Marxist traditions, some current feminist standpoint theories are also located squarely within an empiricist tradition in epistemology. These feminist epistemologies extend the traditional empiricist commitment to experience and observation as the starting points for knowledge. Following Quine and his successors, they recognize and acknowledge that observation is theory-laden and that those theories themselves are artifacts of our making. They also draw on the insight that a set of observation-based data can serve as equally credible evidence for more than one of those theories.

3. Central Themes in Feminist Standpoint Theory

Feminist standpoint theorists such as sociologists Dorothy Smith and Patricia Hill Collins, political philosophers Nancy Hartsock and Alison Jaggar, sociologist of science Hilary Rose, and philosopher of science Sandra Harding extended and reframed the idea of the standpoint of the proletariat to mark out the logical space for a feminist standpoint. Their principal claim regarding feminist standpoint theories is that certain socio-political positions occupied by women (and by extension other groups who lack social and economic privilege) can become sites of epistemic privilege and thus productive starting points for enquiry into questions about not only those who are socially and politically marginalized, but also those who, by dint of social and political privilege, occupy the positions of oppressors. This claim is captured by Sandra Harding thus: “Starting off research from women’s lives will generate less partial and distorted accounts not only of women’s lives but also of men’s lives and of the whole social order.” [1993: 56]

Following Marxist tradition in rejecting liberal assumptions that social and historical factors are irrelevant to epistemic questions, central tenets of feminist standpoint theories include their recognition of the role of social and historical location in shaping epistemic agents and their knowledge, and an embrace of that location as a potentially valuable contribution to knowledge. Feminist standpoint theories work towards an epistemic approach that continues to value objectivity (albeit rethought and reworked) as a goal of enquiry, while at the same time accommodating, analyzing and understanding the effects of social location on epistemic agents and on knowledge. This stance is in stark contrast to the relatively pervasive traditional assumption that recognizing the effects of the socio-historical location of epistemic agents rather than abstracting them from that location disrupts enquiry. Feminist standpoint theories, then, involve a commitment to the view that all attempts to know are socially situated. The social situation of an epistemic agent—her gender, class, race, ethnicity, sexuality and physical capacities—plays a role in forming what we know and limiting what we are able to know. They can affect what we are capable of knowing and what we are permitted to know. The influence of social location on epistemic content and capacity can be felt throughout our epistemic practices, shaping not only the way in which we understand the world, but also the way in which it is presented to us via experience. Consider the following example offered by Terri Elliot:

Person A approaches a building and enters it unproblematically. As she approaches she sees something perfectly familiar which, if asked, she might call ‘The Entrance’. Person X approaches the same building and sees a great stack of stairs and the glaring lack of a ramp for her wheelchair. [1994: 424]

The experience of person A is of the entrance to a building. Whereas the experience of person X is of a barrier to entrance and (at best) an inconvenience. Person X’s social location—qua person with a disability—means that the building presents differently to her from how it does to someone without a disability.

Feminist standpoint theories seek, moreover, to go beyond analysis and description of the role played by social location in structuring and shaping knowledge. The normative aspect of feminist standpoint theories manifests firstly in a commitment to the thesis that the ways in which power relations inflect knowledge need not be understood as with a subjectivity that threatens their objectivity; rather that socially situated knowledge can be properly objective. Secondly, feminist standpoint theories’ normative weight is felt via their commitment to the claim, developed by extension of the Marxist view of the epistemic status of the standpoint of the proletariat, that some social locations, specifically marginalized locations, are epistemically superior in that they afford hitherto unrecognized epistemic privilege, thereby correcting falsehoods and revealing previously suppressed truths. Thus, as Sandra Harding puts it, “Standpoint theories map how a social and political disadvantage can be turned into an epistemic, scientific and political advantage.” [2004; 7-8]

Standpoint theories, then, move beyond a descriptive situated-knowledge thesis to a normative thesis, among the transformative objectives of which is a more socially just world.

4. What is a Standpoint?

The concept of a standpoint employed in feminist standpoint theories takes a narrow meaning, owed to Marxist theory, according to which a standpoint is an achieved collective identity or consciousness. The establishment of a standpoint is the political achievement of those whose social location forms its starting point; it is not merely ascribed from beyond that location. There is a consensus among feminist standpoint theorists that a standpoint is not merely a perspective that is occupied simply by dint of being a woman. Whereas a perspective is occupied as a matter of the fact of one’s socio-historical position and may well provide the starting point for the emergence of a standpoint, a standpoint is earned through the experience of collective political struggle, a struggle that requires, as Nancy Hartsock puts it, both science and politics [Harding 2004: p. 8]. By way of emphasis of this point, Hartsock uses the label ‘feminist standpoint’ whereas Dorothy Smith uses the label ‘women’s standpoint’, reflecting the way in which standpoint theory argues for “women’s place” as a starting point for enquiry [Harding 2004: 21].

So while both the dominant and the dominated occupy perspectives, the dominated are much more successfully placed to achieve a standpoint. Nevertheless, it is not impossible for those who occupy non-marginalized perspectives to become part of the process of helping reach a shared critical consciousness with respect to the effects of power structures on epistemic production. There are many different lives consisting of many different activities and many different social relations and, thus, potentially many different consciousnesses and many different standpoints. The ongoing political and epistemic project of achieving a standpoint offers critical insights that give rise to a new perspective on reality. Sandra Harding explains the point thus,

Only through such struggles can we begin to see beneath the appearances created by an unjust social order to the reality of how this social order is in fact constructed and maintained. This need for struggle emphasizes the fact that a feminist standpoint is not something that anyone can have simply by claiming it. It is an achievement. A standpoint differs in this respect from a perspective, which anyone can have simply by ‘opening one’s eyes’. [1991: 127]

5. Acquiring Knowledge via Standpoints

According to feminist standpoint theories, the process of achieving knowledge begins when standpoints begin to emerge. They emerge when those who are marginalized and relatively invisible from the vantage point of the epistemically privileged become conscious of their social situation with respect to socio-political power and oppression, and begin to find a voice. It is no historical accident that feminist standpoint theory emerged in academic discourses more or less contemporaneously with the feminist consciousness movement within feminist activism. This demonstrates the way in which feminist standpoint theories are grounded in feminist political practice. Contrary to the tendency of critics who perceive feminist standpoint theory via an individualist lens, mistakenly reducing the notion of a standpoint to an individual’s social location, the emergence of standpoints is a collective process occurring through the recognition and acknowledgment of others who occupy more or less the same standpoint as oneself. Although such narratives may form a starting point, the emergence of a standpoint does not consist merely in the telling of individual women’s narratives. Self-definition in terms of a standpoint provides a starting point for the self-assertion of one’s own identity, challenging those identities imposed by conventional stereotypes that form part of hegemonic ways of thinking from the point of view of the socially and politically dominant. This assertion of identity—of who I am—adds to a body of knowledge about how my life is and how I experience the world. Those truths debunk myths about me, about my relationship with the world, and about my relationships with others in that world that have heretofore been taken to be true. In this vein, Patricia Hill Collins discusses a stereotypical understanding of African American women working as domestic servants—the Mammy stereotype which objectifies black women as ‘faithful and obedient’ domestic servants, dedicated to the care of their white family—in contrast to the Sapphire, controlling and manipulative, or the Jezebel, a temptress [1990; 456]. As Collins shows, stereotypes such as these serve as ‘controlling images’ that serve to reinforce for everyone, including African American women, the ways of thinking from the point of view of the racially and sexually dominant. This way of thinking oppresses as it constrains what can be known about being an African American woman. African American women, rather than racist and sexist social structures, are blamed for that oppression. Thus the epistemic process whereby a standpoint emerges enables the occupants of that standpoint to gain an element of power and control over knowledge about their lives. In becoming occupants of a standpoint, they also become knowing subjects in their own right, rather than merely objects that are known by others.

As shown by the claim from Harding that appears at the end of the previous section, feminist standpoint theorists argue that the epistemic and political advantages of beginning enquiry from within women’s lived experiences are not limited to providing a truer account of those lives, but of all the lives and socio-political relations within which those lives are enmeshed. Initial enquiry in women’s lived experiences, mediated by the politicized consciousness that emerges within a feminist standpoint, reveals the way in which male-dominated ideologies distort reality. Standpoints make visible aspects of social relations and of the natural world that are unavailable from dominant perspectives, and in so doing they generate the kinds of questions that will lead to a more complete and true account of those relations. Feminist standpoint theorists point out that, in order to survive within social structures in which one is oppressed, one is required to understand practices of oppression, to understand both oppressed and oppressor; but, this epistemic bi-polarity is neither required of, nor available to, the dominant. For example, the colonized have to learn the language of the colonizer—the New Zealand Māori learned English while use of the Māori language was strongly discouraged, for instance—in order to survive colonization, but the colonizer need not learn the language of the colonized in order to survive. The colonized, then, have some means of entry into the world of the colonizer, and the potential for gaining some understanding of how the world works from that perspective, but the colonizer is generally shut out of the world of the colonized and restricted to a mono-visual view of how the world is. The double vision afforded via the social location of women and other marginalized groups can provide the epistemic advantage of insights into social relations that are unavailable to the non-marginalized. An illustration of the way in which the often undervalued, messy caring work (caring for the sick and the elderly, bearing and raising children, unrewarding, unpaid domestic labor, emotional labor) in which women are traditionally engaged offers productive epistemic starting points; Hartsock cites a passage from Marilyn French’s novel The Women’s Room:

Washing the toilet used by three males, and the floor and walls around it, is, Mira thought, coming face to face with necessity. And that is why women were saner than men, did not come up with the made, absurd schemes men developed; they were in touch with necessity, they had to wash the toilet bowl and the floor. [Harding 2004: 43; French, 1978: 214]

Mediated via a critical standpoint, Mira’s lived experience could form a wellspring of epistemic insights not only into the gender power relations of which her situation (cleaning up men’s mess) is a result, but also of the basic necessities of all our lives and of the need to ensure that they are met equitably. Thus, from this starting point in the material condition of women’s lives, questions arise that would not otherwise get asked, and these questions can form rich sites for research, for policy reform and, ultimately, for social change. For instance, such questions might address issues such as violence against women—why is it so prevalent in so many societies against women of all classes and races, and why are women so often blamed for it? While violence against women remains an ongoing challenge and tragedy, women have derived epistemic advantage from the conceptual resources and clearer understanding of violence that has been afforded to them within feminist standpoints. In turn, this stronger understanding has flowed into social and political discourses to the extent that, at least in some parts of the world, violence is no longer considered acceptable or part of the normal dynamics of a marriage or partnership. Moreover, campaigning by women and their male allies has resulted, in some jurisdictions, in an anti-violence policy environment, and in legal protection and redress for women. Moreover, women’s feminist stand against family violence has (among other factors) motivated researchers to look for and critically analyze the causes and conditions of family violence, such as poverty and inter-generational family violence. In so doing, they have widened understanding of, and enquiry into, family violence more generally to encompass violence perpetrated on children, on male partners, and on elders. Other sites of enquiry that emerge from women’s lived experience might include: Gender equity in the workplace—why are women so over-represented in low-paid and under- or unvalued caring work?; Gender equity in the domestic sphere—why is it often considered normal or usual for a woman to work a double shift, one outside the home and one at home?; Bodies and their normal biological processes—why are menstruation, birthing and menopause understood as medical problems to be treated as illnesses?; Women’s bodies and objectification—why do women’s bodies continue to be used to promote and sell products that run the gamut from instant coffee powder to motorsport?

The development of a standpoint by the dominated dissipates the conceptual dissonance experienced by someone who has been forced to adopt dominant conceptual frameworks that do not truly belong to them. Conceptual frameworks emanating from patriarchal systems fail to provide cognitive tools that enable women and others who are marginalized to make sense of their experiences in and of the world. The emergence of appropriate conceptual frameworks furnishes the marginalized with the cognitive tools to become epistemic subjects, whereas previously they are merely known by others. It enables them to name and think about their experiences in ways that properly represent those experiences. That is not to say that existing conceptual frameworks have been of no use whatsoever for women, for even this conceptual dissonance has been mediated and expressed within those frameworks. Rather, thinking from within a standpoint enables the emergence of conceptual frameworks which resolve the contradictions that arise, and fill the gaps and silences that are left empty when using a conceptual framework that is not entirely fit for purpose.

Some critics of standpoint theories have charged that their central claim of epistemic advantage amounts to a claim of automatic epistemic privilege. However, as we have seen in Section 4, a standpoint is not equivalent to a social location and the standpoint theorist’s claim is not that epistemic advantage is bestowed by dint of one’s social location, but that it is rather earned through involvement in collective political struggle. Theorists argue that experiences of the marginalized reveal problems to be explained; problems that can become research agendas or policy issues/initiatives and are a source of objectivity-maximizing questions. Such questions force us to examine the beliefs, prejudices and biases of the dominant groups in society, the propositions that have previously counted as knowledge. It is in this way, feminist standpoint theorists propose, that we achieve less partial and distorted understandings of all of our lives than we do if we allow questions about those lives to originate only from the experiences of dominant groups. The realities of women’s lives, then, can provide sites of enquiry that lead to new, more complete, less partial, and more objective knowledge.

Moreover, as Alison Wylie argues [2004: 345-6], standpoint theorists’ situated-knowledge claims explicitly undermine the conventional assumption that objective epistemic agents are non-specifically located, and that they are neutral and disinterested with respect to the subject of their enquiry. In so doing, however, standpoint theorists’ approach to the method of enquiry demonstrates a commitment to what are typically taken to be its virtues when it is scientific: empirical adequacy, construed as either empirical depth or breadth; internal coherence; inferential robustness; consistency with relevant well-established bodies of knowledge; and, explanatory power. Indeed, as Wylie notes, feminist interventions in social and scientific enquiry have been successful in demonstrating how it thus far has not always manifested those virtues. Standpoint theorists move beyond this critical moment, showing how the inclusion of lived realities, not yet properly visible to enquirers, can make for better-supported hypotheses. In a case study of archaeology considered in their article “Coming to Terms with the Values of Science”, Wylie and Nelson point out the ways in which researchers taking a gender-sensitive standpoint with respect to studies on netting and basketry and on skeletal remains have resulted in (among other things) a widening of the evidential base of archaeological enquiry in these areas, leading to the re-examination of established hypotheses [2007: 64-70].

6. The Outsider Within

The epistemic advantage of the ‘double vision’ afforded to those in the position of being outsiders within is a recurring theme of feminist standpoint theories. Several theorists emphasize the epistemic advantage afforded to those forced conceptually to straddle both sides of a dichotomous social divide. That advantage is captured by black feminist critic Bell Hooks’ description of growing up in small-town Kentucky thus:

Living as we did—on the edge—we developed a particular way of seeing reality. We looked both from the outside in and from the inside out…we understood both. [1984: vii]

Patricia Hill Collins, for instance, considers black feminist academics to occupy a position of potential epistemic privilege in so far as they are, on the one hand, insiders by dint of their position as authentic academics; yet, on the other hand, outsiders in so far as they are women and black, thus remaining to some extent decentered within the context of the Academy. This places them in a unique position from which to understand how things are in the Academy from the perspective of an insider who enjoys some degree of power and privilege both professionally and personally as a result of her membership, and who at the same time has an understanding of how things are from the perspective of one who is marginalized with respect to the centre of that power as a result of her gender and race. The dual perspective available to someone in this position leaves her well-placed to recognize the underlying assumptions and evaluative commitments that drive and shape the dynamics of power within the Academy, while at the same time providing her with a critical frame of reference derived from her own experience of the Academy, within which to potentially gain a better understanding of its power structures and dynamics. A dual perspective such as this, then, could form the basis of a feminist standpoint which would generate challenging questions about the social and political structures that engender the reality that black women academics experience in their professional and personal lives. In addition, standpoint theories offer explanatory resources for understanding how this dual positioning can potentially bestow epistemic advantage.

The self-reflexivity inherent in the identification of this insider/outsider position as a potentially advantaged epistemic location connects with the broader feminist theme of the (often vexed) relationship between feminist practice and feminist theory. Several feminist standpoint theorists’ work starts in their own lives, their initial site of analysis is the material experience of women as academics and scientists. Feminist sociologist Dorothy Smith argues that women sociologists are placed at the centre of a contradiction in the relation of their discipline to their experience of the world. This contradiction leads to a ‘bifurcation of consciousness’ [Harding 2004: p. 27]. On one side of that divide is the conceptual practice of academic work conducted within the conceptual structures of the discipline of sociology; and on the other, the concrete of the domestic sphere. She argues that sociological discourse has been authored and authorized by men, noting that the frames of reference against which its discourses of enquiry and discussion take place have their origins in men’s lived experiences, not women’s. The sociologist is thus conceived of as male, and women cannot be afforded the status of full participants in the practices of sociology without suffering a ‘double estrangement’. To gain legitimacy and status as sociologists they must suspend their identities qua women.

In her “Hand, Brain and Heart: A Feminist Epistemology for the Natural Sciences”, Hilary Rose makes similar points with respect to women in the natural sciences—‘Women Scientists in the Men’s Laboratories’, as she puts it [Harding 2004: 75]. Those women also have to negotiate the contradictory demands of private and professional spheres. Drawing on physicist Evelyn Fox Keller’s accounts of her experiences as a student (which includes narrative of male students avoiding her and a male university teacher not countenancing the possibility that she could solve mathematical problems without male help), Rose, like Smith, identifies a split in the woman scientist’s consciousness: she is ‘cut in two’, her abstract, conceptual scientific labor arises in ‘painful contradiction’ with her caring labor [Harding 2004: 76]. The implicit requirement that a woman suppress part of herself in order to acquire any professional credibility is one reason, Rose argues, why women scientists were, and in some disciplines remain, comparative rarities.

Thus, while the outsider-within position can afford the epistemic advantage of ‘double vision’ in the absence of the kind of political context and consciousness of which a standpoint is constituted, those benefits can remain unrealized as women scientists suppress their identity as women and as feminists in order to pass as scientists. As Uma Narayan has argued, it should be acknowledged that this colonialized bi-culturalism has a ‘dark side’ [Harding 2004: 221-3] with which women adopt various strategies to survive. In order to negotiate and cope, the best she can, with various contexts in which she finds herself having to operate, a woman might suppress part of herself in some of those contexts while assuming the persona best suited to each. Thus some women professionals emphasize only those characteristics considered valuable in their professional context, allowing themselves to be women and feminist only in private contexts. Alternatively, a woman might simply try to imitate the traits, habits and practices of the dominant group while suppressing herself entirely. For the feminist standpoint theorist, an alternative to these strategies is to attempt to remain within the contradictory contexts, and to do so critically. This is, potentially, the most epistemically powerful response, but it is also the most challenging given the risk of alienation from oneself and from those with whom one may have the most in common.

The difficulty of surmounting such challenges might account, in part, for the tension inherent in many feminist standpoint theorists’ accounts of epistemic insight. This tension arises between, on the one hand, recognition that epistemic insights occur as a result of an individual’s insider/outsider experience and, on the other, the central claim that a standpoint is a shared, rather than an individual, achievement. Perhaps the existence of this tension reinforces the claim that, while epistemic insight is achievable on the basis of individual insider/outsider experience, it is only from the political context and shared consciousness of a standpoint that such insights can be truly advantageous and move those within it from improved understanding of the realities of their lives towards social and political change.

7. Controversies

More than three decades have passed since the publication of the first work that developed and advocated feminist standpoint theories. Yet standpoint theory remains controversial and its controversies manifest both between and beyond feminist scholars, as Alison Wylie writes,

Standpoint theory may rank as one of the most contentious theories to have been proposed and debated in the twenty-five to thirty year history of second-wave feminist thinking about knowledge and science. Its advocates, as much as its critics, disagree vehemently about its parentage, its status as a theory, and crucially, its relevance to current thinking about knowledge. [Harding 2004: 339-40]

This section outlines what are perhaps the most significant challenges to feminist standpoint theory.

a. False Universalism

Since feminist standpoint theories take the view that enquiry is best started from within women’s material experience and that epistemic advantage ensues from within standpoints that emerge from that experience, they can mistakenly be understood to espouse an essentialist universalism, according to which women are afforded automatic epistemic privilege simply for the fact of their being women. Since feminist standpoint theorists argue that enquiry is best started from women’s lives, and that standpoints emerge only when women begin to reflect upon and question the reality of those lives through a politicized framework, feminist standpoint theories can also be misunderstood as proposing a single, monolithic feminist standpoint. This misunderstanding presents this feminist standpoint as arising not from ordinary women’s lives but from the lives of relatively privileged, mostly middle-class, mostly white, women academics.

A good proportion of the work that has since built on early moments in feminist standpoint theory has focused on incorporating considerations of difference within feminist standpoint theories. Feminist standpoint theories are clearly not committed to the project of formulating a homogenous women’s or feminist standpoint. Rather, they recognize that women’s presence in many areas of the terrain of social and economic marginalization means that women occupy positions at the intersection of a number of oppressive social structures.

However, reconciliation between feminist standpoint theories and those feminist theories which prioritize difference remains problematic and presents a dilemma: The formation of a standpoint requires shared experiences of oppression and of struggle against that oppression. But the inclusion of those experiences within a standpoint, it can be argued, runs the risk of occluding epistemically significant differences between women. A feminist standpoint may be taken (implicitly) as the position of all women, but what account is taken of class, race, sexuality, and other markers of difference, which structure the power relations that generate oppression, the shared experience of which forms the basis of the standpoint? The response to this dilemma from within standpoint theory has been, firstly, to emphasize that feminist standpoint theories envisage a plurality of feminist standpoints; and, secondly, to modify feminist standpoint theories to take account of the ways in which women’s different experiences at the intersections of various oppressive social structures will engender different standpoints. Patricia Hill Collins and Bell Hooks, for example, have developed black feminist standpoint theories that take into account the role of women of color in slavery and in devalued menial and caring labor, and the way in which this oppression is experienced at the hands of other, mostly white, women.

Thirdly, some feminist standpoint theorists respond head-on to the charge that by focusing on the experiences that are common to most women, standpoint theories fail to take account of significant differences between women. Maria Mies and Vandana Shiva, for example, participate in the feminist standpoint conversation from within their own experiences as activists in the women’s and ecology movements. They argue, contrary to the charge of false universalization, that there are many examples of women’s activism in pursuit of environmental causes which demonstrate the reality of women overcoming differences and developing a shared sense of solidarity through which they begin to gain an understanding of the oppressive relations in which their lives are enmeshed [Harding, 2004: 334-5]. Thus, as standpoints emerge, some differences will be occluded, but some significant similarities will be thrown into sharper relief.

Postmodernist feminist critics argue not only that the risk of occlusion of difference remains but, more fatally with respect to the possibility of reconciliation, the categories upon which feminist standpoint theory depends—woman, feminist, knowledge—are fluid and in a state of socially influenced flux and contestation, making it impossible ever properly to capture experiences and identities within standpoints. Standpoint theorists counter that the idea that identity is fluid itself puts the political power of feminism at risk and threatens the loss of the material experience of women’s oppression. Standpoint and postmodernist feminism remain opposed in this respect: the former requires materiality as its starting point, the latter rejects the reality of that ‘real world’ outright. As Haraway puts the point from the perspective of the former position:

[T]o lose authoritative biological accounts of sex, which set up productive tensions with its binary pair, gender, seems to be to lose too much; it seems to be to lose not just analytical power within a particular Western tradition, but the body itself as anything but a blank page for social inscriptions, including those of biological discourse. [Harding 2004: p. 94]

b. Epistemic Relativism

The charge that feminist standpoint epistemologies are committed to a politically dangerous epistemic relativism ensues from the claim that all knowledge is socially situated and that some social values enhance the process of enquiry and the acquisition of knowledge.

In response to this charge, Sandra Harding reconceptualizes objectivity, arguing for the pursuit of strong objectivity [1993: passim]. Harding argues that standpoint theory imposes a rigorous logic of discovery involving a strong demand for ongoing reflection and self-critique from within a standpoint, enabling the justification of socially-situated knowledge claims. This critical approach, Harding asserts, results in a stronger notion of objectivity than that achieved by traditional approaches to enquiry. The traditional starting point for knowledge is the position of the dominant and, despite assumptions to the contrary, that position is ideologically permeated. This results in partial and distorted accounts of reality, which thereby fail to live up to modernistic standards of impartiality, neutrality and universality associated with a commitment to epistemic objectivity.

With regard to the idea that the reconceptualization of objectivity represents a retreat from modernity, rationality and science [Walby, 2001: 489], Harding labels her feminist standpoint approach ‘neo-modern’ [2001: 518]. By these lights, feminist standpoint theories remain committed to strengthening modernist commitments to truth and objectivity, but are distanced from modernity’s absolutist overtones. Strong objectivity encompasses a sense of completeness and a lack of distortion. The ultimate epistemic goal of enquiry based on this model would be the inclusion of all standpoints, enabling the revelation of different aspects of truth. This would be a dialectical process consistent with standpoint theories’ roots in the Marxist tradition. Objective enquiry modelled thus requires trust—we need to trust others truthfully to reveal aspects of reality. Conceived thus, objectivity is not a goal that is easily achievable.

c. The Bias Paradox

Some, such as Helen Longino [1993] and Susan Hekman [1997] have argued that two of the central tenets of feminist standpoint theories—the claim that knowledge is socially situated and the claim that marginalized standpoints (but not perspectives) offer epistemic advantage—are in deep tension with each other. On the one hand, it is claimed that there is no standpoint-neutral vantage point from which to make judgements about the relative epistemic superiority of certain standpoints over other ways of knowing the world; while on the other it is claimed that marginalized standpoints are, indeed, epistemically better than the epistemic positions of the non-marginalized. If this tension cannot be resolved, it is argued, the standpoint theorist is pushed back towards the relativistic embrace of ‘multiple and incompatible knowledge positions’ [Longino 1993: 107].

Harding’s ‘strong objectivity’ suggests a possible dissolution of this apparent tension. Responses to the claim of a bias paradox offered by Rebecca Kukla [2006] and Kristina Rollins can be understood as means by which Harding’s notion can be realized. Both draw upon the resources of contextual approaches to epistemic justification to show how taking account of the social location of epistemic agents can strengthen knowledge claims. Kukla draws upon and extends Wilfrid Sellars’ account of perceptual warrant to argue for an account of epistemic objectivity in which contingent, contextual factors such as gender and race are recognized as sources of justification for knowledge claims, rather than rejected as disruptors of ‘aperspectival’ objective epistemic endeavor [2006: 86-7]. Only when we are socially located in certain respects, Kukla argues, can we best perceive certain aspects of reality.

Rollins, meanwhile, argues that the bias paradox arises out of a foundationalist framework: The standard of impartiality against which standpoints would be assessed involves basic, foundational beliefs and, according to foundationalism, these cannot be socially situated; hence, the tension between standpoint theories’ epistemic advantage thesis on the one hand and situated knowledge thesis on the other. Drawing and expanding upon the resources of Michael Williams’ contextualism, Rollins argues that by offering a standard of impartiality provided by a context of default entitlements whose status as such is always context-dependent, contextualism shows how it is possible to establish standards of epistemic justification that are themselves situated knowledge claims [2006: 129]. It is against a background of a standard such as this that it would be possible to claim, without retreat to relativism, that marginalized standpoints can offer epistemic advantage.

Generally, with respect to their commitment to objectivity, then, feminist standpoint theories can be understood as attempts to synthesize the elements that usually create an inherent tension in feminist and emancipationist projects. This tension arises from acknowledging the epistemic value of the inescapable social situation and dependence of epistemic subjects and of knowledge, and yet remaining committed to the idea that we don’t make the world up. Feminist standpoint theory attempts to occupy a position that incorporates both epistemic deference to the world and acceptance of the way in which that world and the ways we experience and understand it are shaped by our material circumstances. Feminist standpoint theory is also informed by an acceptance of the way in which different experiences, needs and interests give rise to different practices, and different ways of thinking about and interacting with the world, some of which are better than others. Real knowledge on this view just is socially situated; it is interested as opposed to disinterested [Harding 2004: 24-25]. In this vein, feminist standpoint theory serves as a critique of conventional epistemic standards, arguing that what Donna Haraway dubbed ‘the God Trick’—the traditional epistemic view that knowledge is only achieved by adopting a disinterested, impartial view from nowhere—is unachievable, for knowledge is always from somewhere [Harding, 2004: 93].

8. References and Further Reading

Many of the seminal articles on feminist standpoint theories (including the papers by Dorothy Smith, Nancy Hartsock, Hilary Rose, Patricia Hill Collins and Donna Haraway) mentioned in this article are now collected together in Harding’s The Feminist Standpoint Theory Reader. Harding’s collection also includes more recent papers that make new contributions to these debates, including the papers by Mies and Shiva, Narayan and Wylie.

Susan Hekman’s article, “Truth and Method: Feminist Standpoint Theory Revisited”, Signs Vol 22, No. 2 (Winter, 1997) provides a critical response to feminist standpoint theories which manifests the tension between standpoint theory and the preoccupations of postmodernist feminism. That article and replies from Harding, Hartsock, Hill Collins and Smith all appear in Harding’s 2004 collection.

a. Works Cited

Terri Elliot, “Making Strange What had Appeared Familiar”, The Monist; Oct94, Vol. 77 Issue 4
Evelyn Fox Keller, “The Anomaly of a Woman in Physics” in Sara Ruddick and Pamela Daniels, eds., Working it Out: 23 Women, Writers, Scientists and Scholars Talk about their Lives, New York: Pantheon Books, 1977
Marilyn French, The Women’s Room, New York: Jove, 1978
Sandra Harding Whose Science/ Whose Knowledge? Milton Keynes: Open University Press, 1991
Sandra Harding, “Rethinking Standpoint Epistemology: What is Strong Objectivity?” in L. Alcoff and E. Potter, eds., Feminist Epistemologies, New York/London: Routledge, 1993 (also appears in Harding, 2004)
Sandra Harding, “Comment on Walby’s ‘Against Epistemological Chasms: The Science Question in Feminism Revisited’: Can Democratic Values and Interests Every Play a Rationally Justifiable Role in the Evaluation of Scientific Work?, Signs, Vol. 26, No. 2 (Winter 2001)
Sandra Harding, ed., The Feminist Standpoint Theory Reader New York and London: Routledge, 2004
Donna Haraway, “Situated Knowledges” in Harding 2004
Nancy Hartsock, “The Feminist Standpoint: Developing the Ground for a Specifically Feminist Historical Materialism” in Harding, 2004
Patricia Hill Collins, Black Feminist Thought: Knowledge, Consciousness and the Politics of Empowerment, New York and London: Routledge, 1990
Patricia Hill Collins, “Learning from the Outsider Within: The Sociological Significance of Black Feminist Thought” in Harding 2004
Bell Hooks, From Margin to Center, Boston: South End Press, 1984
Rebecca Kukla, “ Objectivity and Perspective in Empirical Knowledge”. Episteme 3(1): 80-95. 2006
Helen Longino, ‘Subjects, Power, and Knowledge: Description and Prescription in Feminist Philosophies of Science’ in Feminist Epistemologies, L. Alcoff and E. Potter (eds.), New York: Routledge, 1993, 101-120.
Maria Mies and Vandana Shiva, “The Subsistence Perspective” in Harding, 2004
Uma Narayan, “The Project of Feminist Epistemology: Perspectives from a Nonwestern Feminist” in Harding, 2004
Kristina Rolin, “ The Bias Paradox in Feminist Standpoint Epistemology” Episteme 1(2): 125-136. 2006
Hilary Rose, “Hand, Brain and Heart: A Feminist Epistemology for the Natural Sciences” in Harding, 2004
Wilfrid Sellars, Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind, Harvard: Harvard University Press, 1997
Dorothy Smith, “Women’s Perspective as a Radical Critique of Sociology” in Harding, 2004
Sylvia Walby, “Against Epistemological Chasms: the Science Question in Feminism Revisited” Signs, Vol. 26, No. 2 (Winter 2001)
Michael Williams, Problems of Knowledge: A Critical Introduction to Epistemology, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press, 2001
Alison Wylie, “Why Standpoint Matters” in Harding, 2004
Alison Wylie & Lynn Hankinson Nelson, “Coming to terms with the values of science: Insights from feminist science studies scholarship” In Value-free science: Ideals and illusions, eds. Harold Kincaid, John Dupré, and Alison Wylie. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007

b. Earlier Papers

Sally J. Kenney and Helen Kinsella, eds. Politics and Feminist Standpoint Theories, New York and London, The Haworth Press, 1997

c. Later Contributions

Sharon Crasnow, “Feminist anthropology and sociology: Issues for social science” In Handbook of the philosophy of science, Volume 15: Philosophy of anthropology and sociology, 2006
Sharon Crasnow, “Is Standpoint Theory a Resource for Feminist Epistemology? An Introduction” Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 189-192.
Sandra Harding, Sciences from below: Feminisms, postcolonialities, and modernities, Raleigh: Duke University Press, 2008.
Sandra Harding, “Standpoint Theories: Productively Controversial”, Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 192-200.
Kristen Intemann, “Standpoint empiricism: Rethinking the terrain in feminist philosophy of science” In New waves in philosophy of science, eds. P.D. Magnus and Jacob Busch. Houndsmills, Basingstoke, Hampshire, UK: Palgrave MacMillan, 2010; 198-225.
Kourany, Janet, “The Place of Standpoint Theory in Feminist Science Studies”, Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 209-218.
Kourany, Janet, “Standpoint Theory as a Methodology for the Study of Power Relations”, Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 218-226.
Joseph Rouse, “Standpoint Theories Reconsidered” Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 200-209.
Miriam Solomon, “Standpoint and Creativity”, Hypatia 24(4) 2009: 226-237.

Author Information

T. Bowell
Email: TABOO@waikato.ac.nz
University of Waikato
New Zealand

Chrysippus (c. 280—207 B.C.E.)

Chrysippus was among the most influential philosophers of the Hellenistic period. He is usually thought of as the most important influence on Stoicism. A later Stoic catchphrase ran, “If Chrysippus had not existed, neither would the Stoa.” (Lives 292). Carneades, the fourth Chair of the New Academy, modified the phrase to, “If Chrysippus had not existed, neither would I.” (Lives 438) Chrysippus defended and developed an empiricist epistemology and psychology. He offered important alternatives to the metaphysical theories of Aristotle and Plato, defending a thoroughgoing materialist ontology. His views concerning freedom and determinism continue to generate interest, and he is thought to have endorsed a form of compatibilism countenancing both freedom of the will and a deterministic cosmos. His work in logic was considerable, as he developed, as an alternative to the logic of Aristotle, a kind of propositional logic. As an ethicist, he maintained that the life of human happiness and the life of virtue are one and the same. He seems to have thought virtue is best understood as related essentially, if not entirely reducible, to wisdom. And he thought wisdom derives especially from the study of natural philosophy. That Chrysippus would take wisdom to derive primarily from the study of natural philosophy may be explained, in part, by his conviction that the cosmos exists in accordance with proper ends.

Life and Times
Sources
Epistemology
1. Perception
2. Epistemic Criteria
Logic
Metaphysics
Ethics
1. Eudaimonism
2. The Unity of Virtues
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Times

Chrysippus was born in Soli, near what is today known as Mersin, Turkey. He died in the 143^rd Olympiad at the age of seventy-three (living c. 280-207 B.C.E.). Diogenes Laertius, in his Lives of the Philosophers, reports that before becoming a student of Cleanthes, Chrysippus used to practice as a long-distance runner (287 B.C.E.). He was a master dialectician. Most people thought, according to Diogenes Laertius, that if the gods took to dialectic, they would adopt no other system than that of Chrysippus (289 B.C.E.). Cleanthes had succeeded Zeno, who had founded the school at the Stoa Poikilê in 262 B.C.E. Chrysippus, having taught outside the school for a number of years, returned to succeed his former teacher in 230 B.C.E. Stoicism continued to flourish after his death, as the work begun by early Stoics was continued in the era of Panaetius and Posidonius, and later into the Roman Imperial period by thinkers such as Seneca, Epictetus, and Marcus Aurelius.

2. Sources

Chrysippus was a prolific writer. He is reported to have written more than 705 books (SVF 2.1). No single treatise remains, and we have something in the neighborhood of 475 fragments. Two doxographies stand out—Diogenes Laertius’ Lives of the Philosophers, hereafter, and above, (Lives), and pseudo-Plutarch’s Philosopher’s Opinions on Nature. Cicero writes several works that are of use in reconstructing Stoic thought: Academica, De Finibus, and De Natura Deorum, are among the most important. These contain summaries and critical evaluations of the views of the Hellenistic schools, and although Cicero identifies with the Academics, he is not without sympathy for Stoic philosophy. It is from these sources primarily that scholars have attempted to cobble together a set of fragments and testimonia that present a coherent picture of Stoicism and Stoic philosophers. The Stoicorum Veterum Fragmenta, hereafter (SVF), compiled in three volumes by H. von Arnim, is one of the more important collections of fragments in Greek and Latin, and it is customary to refer to Stoic fragments by making use of von Arnim’s volume numbers and numbering system. More recently, David Sedley and A.A. Long have produced an English translation and commentary of the principal sources of Hellenistic philosophy, The Hellenistic Philosophers, hereafter (LS). Corresponding Greek and Latin texts, with notes and bibliography, can be found in the second volume of this work.

3. Epistemology

a. Perception

Zeno, the founder of Stoicism, defined ‘presentation’ as an impression (phantasia) upon the soul (SVF I 58). That he neglected to indicate what he meant by ‘impression’ is suggested by the controversy between Cleanthes and Chrysippus concerning the exegesis of this term. Cleanthes maintained that an object impresses itself on the soul just as a signet ring impresses itself upon a wax seal—a metaphor Plato had made use of in the Theaetetus (191c8). Chrysippus rejects this model by arguing that if the soul were like a piece of wax (with only one surface exposed), it might only receive one impression at a time. Furthermore, every impression would be lost as the next image impinged upon the former. The soul, however, as Chrysippus argues, receives a number of impressions at once, and it does, in fact, retain some impression while receiving others (Lives 7.50). In place of the wax model, Chrysippus argues that the soul is more akin to air, as air is able to undergo a number of alterations simultaneously, as when a number of individuals are speaking at the same time in the same place. (In fact, the soul, according to Chrysippus, who was a thoroughgoing materialist, is a mixture of air and fire). Chrysippus seems, therefore, to accept an indirect realist view of perception, whereby an impression can represent an external object, i.e., a phantaston:

Chrysippus says that these four, [impression, impressor, imagination, and figment] are to be distinguished from one another. An impression is an affection occurring in the soul that reveals itself and its cause. Thus, when through sight we observe something white, the affection is what is engendered in the soul through vision; and it is this affection (pathos) that enables us to say there is a white object that activates us. The word ‘impression’ (phantasia) is derived from the word light (phõs); just as light reveals itself and whatever else it includes in its range, so impression reveals itself and its cause. (SVF 2.54)

Not every presentation is, however, accurate. Some presentations lack a corresponding ‘impressor’. Although we see what appears to be Clint Eastwood on the silver screen, nobody believes that Clint is actually up there (LS 236). Chrysippus considers a presentation such as this one to be the result of imagination, or a phantastikon. A presentation that is believed, but which lacks an underlying real object, as for example the dragoness of Hades as it appears to Orestes, would be classified as a figment, or a phantasma.

Imagination is an empty attraction, an affection in the soul which arises from no impressor…A figment is that to which we are attracted in the empty attraction of imagination; it occurs in people who are melancholic and mad. (SVF 2.54)

b. Epistemic Criteria

So how does the ruling element of the soul distinguish a real presentation from a mere figment? According to Diogenes Laertius, the Stoics maintained the following (Lives 155):

[W]ith respect to presentations, on the one hand there is the cataleptic, and on the other there is the non-cataleptic. The cataleptic, which they say is the criterion of things, is that which comes to be from an existent object, agrees with the real object itself, having been stamped and imprinted. The non-cataleptic does not come to be from the existent object, or if it does, fails to accord with that which exists; it is neither clear nor distinct.

A cataleptic (“apprehending” or “grasping”) presentation (i) comes from a real object (ii) accurately corresponds to that object, (iii) is imprinted on the sense faculty, and, as we might add, (iv) is clear and distinct. The Stoics, moreover, take the cataleptic impression to be the criterion by means of which one may discern fact from fiction. Needless to say, the Skeptics were eager to ask how it is that one may discern the cataleptic from the non-cataleptic. The conceptual landscape here is filled out aptly by Cicero in his Academica (2.83):

There are four headings to prove there is nothing that can be known, cognized, or grasped, which is the subject of this whole controversy. The first of these is that (i) some false impression does exist. The second is that (ii) it is not cognitive. The third is that (iii) impressions between which there is no difference cannot be such that some are cognitive and others not. The fourth is that (iv) no true impression arises from sensation that does not have alongside it another impression, no different from it, that is not cognitive. Everyone accepts the second and third of these. Epicurus does not grant the first, but you…[Stoics], with whom we are dealing, admit that one. The entire battle is about the fourth.

The Stoics seemed to have denied that a true and a false impression might nevertheless be qualitatively indistinguishable. But, as Cicero goes on to ask, what mark (notum) of a cataleptic impression might one have such that it could not be false? In response to Cicero’s question, the Stoics developed several strategies (Lives 162):

The standard of truth they claim is the cataleptic presentation, i.e., that which comes to be from a real object, according to Chrysippus in the twelfth book of his Physics, and to Antipater and Apollodorus. Boëthus, however, admits a plurality of standards, namely intelligence, sense-perception, appetency, and knowledge. But Chrysippus contradicts himself…and says that the criterion is sensation and preconception (prolepsis). And preconception is a natural concept of the universal. Again, certain others of the older Stoics make orthos logos the criterion; so also does Posidonius in his treatise On the Criterion.

The pivotal question for understanding Chrysippus’ epistemology seems to concern the meaning he attaches to prolepsis. On one reading, these preconceptions might be considered innate concepts. This reading, however, rings inconsonant with the empiricist leanings associated with the Stoics (SVF 2.83):

The Stoics say that whenever a person is born, the hegemonic part of his soul is like a sheet prepared to be written upon. Upon this he writes each one of his conceptions. The first method of inscription is via the senses. For by perceiving something, e.g., white, they have a memory of it when it has departed. And when many memories of a similar kind have occurred, we then say we have experience. For the plurality of similar experiences is experience. Some conceptions arise naturally in the previously mentioned ways without deliberation, others by means of our own instruction and attention. The latter are called merely conceptions. The former are called preconceptions (prolepseis) as well. Reason, for (possessing) which we are called rational, is said to be completed by means of our preconceptions during our first seven years.

The above passage suggests that Stoics viewed the mind as a tabula rasa. Concepts, or prolepseis, are acquired causally by the repetition of similar presentations. (See Aristotle’s Posteria Analytica II.9) Chrysippus seems to have thought that one might compare a given token presentation with the concept one has of the type thereof. When, for example, the sage rejects the presentation of a dragoness, one may note that the dragoness does not match the prolepsis one has of females. If this is his line of thinking, it is fair to say that Chrysippus is sanguine indeed with respect to the reliability of the cognitive mechanism responsible for the acquisition of prolepseis. Optimism at this level, however, accords well with the Stoic view that the world is constructed in accordance with reason (Lives VII.134):

[The Stoics] think that there are two principles of the universe—that which acts, and that which is acted upon. That which is acted upon is unqualified substance, i.e. matter; that which acts is the reason (logos) in it, i.e. god.

Understood in this way, Chrysippus’s view seems to share certain features with those more contemporary epistemologists who are keen to emphasize the proper function of one’s cognitive abilities—more so than one’s subjective relationship to a belief—in the production of beliefs that meet the requirements for warrant or knowledge. The Stoics saw the presence of the divine in terrestrial things. The epistemic faculties, like other faculties, are there for a reason.

4. Logic

The Stoics’ appreciation for logic probably originated with the school’s founder. Zeno studied with Stilpo the Megarian. And Megara was the home of a number of important philosophers engaging in a discipline that we would today call logic. Chrysippus, without question, is the philosopher most responsible for the logic associated with the Stoics. In the following section, we will consider some of the elements that set his logic apart from that of his predecessors, as well as the propositional logic that most students of philosophy are familiar with today.

a. Arguments

One way of understanding Chrysippus’ contribution to logic is to see what Stoic arguments are not. Consider the following argument:

All mammals are warm-blooded animals.
All warm-blooded animals are sanguineous.
So: All mammals are sanguineous.

Aristotle called an argument of this variety a syllogism. He took it as evident that given the truth of the premises, the conclusion is likewise true. Indeed, one need not know the meaning of the terms in the argument to determine that the conclusion follows logically from the premises. One may simply consider the form of the argument:

All A are B A = mammals
All B are C B = warm-blooded animals
So: All A are C C = sanguineous

Logicians consider arguments wherein the conclusion follows from the premises, in just this way, to be valid. It is important to recognize that an argument’s having true premises provides neither necessary nor sufficient grounds for it to be valid. The following argument is valid, as the conclusion follows from the premises, even though the premises would rightly be resisted. The argument thereafter has true premises, but it is clearly invalid, as the premises may be true although the conclusion is false.

All trout are mammals. No viviparous animal is a trout.
All mammals are oviparous. No trout is a mammal.
So: All trout are oviparous. So: No viviparous animal is a mammal.

Consider, next, the following argument. It is clearly valid, but how would one fit it into an Aristotelian syllogism?

If Plato walks, then Plato moves. p = Plato walks.
Plato walks. q = Plato moves.
So: Plato moves.

Aristotle resisted the idea that there could be a scientific demonstration that concerned individuals. (Notice that the Aristotelian arguments above made use of classes). The argument currently under discussion resists an Aristotelian formulation, for the relata herein are propositions—Stoics called these ‘sayables’—rather than classes. In Aristotelian logic, the key connectives are ‘all’, ‘some’, ‘is’, and ‘is not’. In Chrysippus’ logic, the key connectives are ‘if’, ‘or’, ‘and’, and ‘not’. In the forms below, the former represents the form of our argument above; the latter a form that is clearly fallacious:

	If p, then q		If p, then q	p = Plato walks.
	p		q	q = Plato moves.
So:	q	So:	p

Stoics built arguments in this way. Following Aristotle’s lead in the Prior Analytics, they listed a number of indemonstrable modes of argument—forms whose validity is clearly not in question—to which, they were optimistic, all other valid arguments may be reduced. The following is a list of the five indemonstrable forms (the first four have names):

	Modus ponens:	If p, q; p; ergo, q.
	Modus tollens:	If p, q; not q; ergo, not p.
	Modus ponendo tollens:	Either p or q; p; ergo not q.
	Modus tollendo ponens:	Either p or q; not q; ergo p.
		Not both p and q; p; ergo, not q.

b. Propositions

That the Stoics distinguished between simple and complex propositions should be clear from what has been said heretofore. The sayable Plato walks is simple, and the sayable If Plato walks, then Plato moves is complex, as the statements Plato walks and Plato moves are connected by the particles ‘if’ and ‘then’. But Chrysippus’s account of what makes complex ‘sayables’ true or false differs in interesting ways with the truth-functional accounts that many modern philosophers make use of (a sentence is truth-functional when the truth of the sentence is a function of the values of its subsentences). Consider ponendo tollens above and let the value of p be the car won’t start because of a dead battery, and the value of q be the car won’t start because of a bad alternator. When your mechanic asserts the disjunction of these claims, and subsequently finds the former to be true, an inference to the falsity of the latter is not deductively valid. (It might be that you have a bad alternator as well.) This is not the way that Chrysippus seems to have viewed the matter. The Stoics were keen to understand all legitimate disjunctions to present mutually exclusive alternatives, for example, p or q, but not both p and q:

But all the disjuncts must mutually conflict, and their contradictories…must also be mutually opposed. Of all disjuncts, one must be true, the other false. But if neither of them is true, or all or more than one of them are true, or the disjuncts do not conflict, or the contradictories of the disjuncts are not incompatible, then that is false as a disjunctive proposition (LS 301).

For Chrysippus the paradigmatically true conditional is one where the contradictory of the consequent conflicts with the antecedent. In the conditional below, the contradictory of the consequent is Plato does not move. And this claim can reasonably be said to be in conflict with our antecedent: Plato walks.

If (antecedent) Plato walks, then (consequent) Plato moves.

And although there is no detailed or precise account of how Chrysippus understood this notion of conflict, it is likely the case that the conflict in question is of the conceptual variety rather than mere empirical incompatibility (See LS 211). The type of conditional in question can be contrasted with the material conditional of the propositional calculus favored by many modern logicians, where a conditional is true provided the antecedent is false or the consequent is true (or is understood inclusively here). Consider the claim If we have pie, then we will have coffee. The contradictory of our consequent is We will not have coffee, and this claim does not present any real conflict with the antecedent of our claim, namely, We will have pie. Furthermore, a conditional of the material variety is truth-functional, that is, true just by virtue of the truth of its constituents. (The Stoics preferred to express claims of this sort as ‘it is not the case that we will have pie and not have coffee’.) Notice how a Chrysippean conditional, mutatis mutandis a Chrysippean disjunction, depends upon more than the truth-value of its constituents. Not only does it depend upon the contradictory of the consequent, it depends as well on a semantic understanding of what it is to conflict.

c. Modality

As we saw above, the Stoics classified certain kinds of sayables with reference to certain properties that are not part of linguistic form. In addition, Stoics classified sayables in terms of their modal properties, that is, possibility, necessity, impossibility, and non-necessity. (They also considered the properties of plausibility and probability as well (Bobzien 2003). For the Stoics’ account of modality, the Megarians are again an important influence (LS 231):

Diodorus defines the possible as ‘what is or will be’; the impossible as ‘what, being false, will not be true’; the necessary as ‘what being true, will not be false’; and the non-necessary as ‘what either is now, or will be false’.

An account such as this one fixes the possible to the temporal. If something is possible, say a sea-battle, then it occurs at some time. If something is impossible, say a triangle with less than three sides, then there will not be an instance of it at some time. The necessary sayable, for example, triangles have fewer than four sides, is that which will not be false at some time. And the non-necessary, Cypselus is ruling, is a claim that will be false at some time. One difficulty that accounts such as this face is that they do not explain sentences such as the following:

A golden mountain is at the top of Hannah Street.

This coat might have been shredded, but it was burned instead.

Sometimes we express a possibility that we believe will never actualize. Chrysippus offers a criticism similar in kind. He seems to argue that a jewel might never be smashed, but that insofar as one might receive credit for not smashing it, we would nevertheless consider it possible to smash the jewel (LS 235).

The set of modal definitions preferred by the Stoics is difficult to reconstruct. But there is some reason for thinking that Chyrsippus followed Philo in taking possible propositions to be those wherein the internal nature is capable of truth. Precisely what one is to make of the locution ‘internal nature is capable of truth’ is not known. But it is tempting to understand Chrysippus on the basis of his objections to Diodorus, and his account of conditionals, as saying something akin to “a proposition is possible if conceptually self-consistent, and (if) there are no external circumstances preventing it”. The remaining modalities would be defined in relation to the possible.

5. Metaphysics

For reasons similar to those of the Epicureans, the Stoics were materialists. Only that which can affect or be affected may be said to exist, so the argument runs; and only that which is corporeal may affect or be affected (Academica I.39). Nevertheless, their view does admit of a kind of dualism, as everything in the cosmos is the result of an active principle, namely God, upon a passive, or causally inert, indeterminate substrate (Lives VII.134). And for Chrysippus, divine presence in terrestrial things comes in the form of pneuma–a fiery kind of air, or ether (Lives 7.138-9), which gives form and quality to that which is per se devoid of quality. Although the Epicureans, following in the tradition of Democritus and Leucippus, were arguing that everything is made up of the discrete and the indivisible (atomon), the Stoics maintained that the prima materia upon which the active principle exercised its influence is continuous, serving as the substrate for everything from basic continua such as earth, water, air, and fire, to individual organisms such as Socrates and Secretariat. Where the Peripatetic would characterize Secretariat as an individual substance or thing, and brown as a property, or modification, thereof; Chrysippus, and the Stoics in general, would consider Secretariat to be a property or modification of the passive element, and the brown color to be, in turn, a disposition thereof.

a. Ontology

As Simplicius reports in his commentary on Aristotle’s Categories (SVF 2.369):

The Stoics see fit to reduce the number of primary genera, and others they take over with changes in the reduced list. For they make their division a fourfold one, into substrates, the qualified, the disposed, and the relatively disposed.

Thus, the Stoics recognized four main levels of existence, and, as Long and Sedley have argued, there is some reason for thinking that these categories originated with Chrysippus (165). The first category is that of substrate (hupokeimenon). To locate an entity in this first category is to assign it existence without reference to its qualities. This characterless substance is being, or ousia, in its primary sense. The next level of being is that of quality. To be more precise, this level of being is something qualified by the inseparable god, reason, or soul, that pervades the substrate, and on the account of Chrysippus, this takes the form of pneuma (LS 46A). In the second category the Stoics placed modifications or qualified substrates (poia) of the prima materia and, interestingly, it is in this category of qualities, or poia, that the Stoics include people, and organisms, in general. Organisms are, therefore in an important sense, adjectival in being. The third category concerns dispositions of the things that are qualified, or things that are qualified, disposed in some way (põs echonta). Grammatical knowledge, for example, would be a disposition of the grammarian. In the fourth category, the Stoics countenanced dispositions that are relatively so, or pros ti põs echonta. These dispositions bear a resemblance to the so called Cambridge properties that may change without any change to the item under consideration, as, for example, your being to the right of me may occur without my having changed my position.

b. Being, Being Something, and the Nature of Properties

The Stoics were, moreover, materialists. Only corporeals, or somata, exist. Existence, however, is not the highest ontological category. In the Sophist, Plato had suggested that for something x to be some thing was for x to exist. But the Stoics reject Plato’s suggestion, maintaining that reality may be divided on the one hand into corporeals (somata), which may be said to exist; and on the other hand into incorporeals (asomata), which may be said to subsist (SVF 1.65). The Stoics thought that the latter category was comprised of such things as time, place, void, and ‘sayable’ (lekta). The Stoics’ reason for saying that the incoporeals are real has, to be sure, a Meinongian ring. In order to be an object of one’s thought, a lekta, for example, must be something. Otherwise there is nothing one is ex hypothesi thinking about.

Understood in this way, the Stoic ontological classification implicitly rules out properties of a certain kind. Socrates and Glaucon, for example, both have the attribute of being a man. And this invites the question: Does this so called entity Man, under which both are said to be classified, exist? Plato on the received view (but see Grabowski 2008), and Aristotle, held that (i) the property of being a man exists independently of our recognition thereof, and, (ii) that the property, that of being a man, which belongs to Socrates, is numerically identical to the property, similarly described, which belongs to Callias. Though the philosophical literature on properties is less than univocal, in terminology and criteria, those who accept the received view, attributed here to Plato and Aristotle, are frequently referred to as Realists. Those who maintain that properties described in this way do not exist are frequently called Nominalists.

Chrysippus resolutely rejects the views of Plato and Aristotle concerning properties. But the committed Nominalist will have to say something about propositions which are taken to be true, and which, importantly, seem to refer to such entities, call them for present purposes, universals. Consider the following proposition:

(A) Man is a rational mortal animal.

Chrysippus, as we will see below, relies upon the truth of this proposition in his ethical philosophy. The advocate of this proposition, however, would seem to be committed to the universal Man. In order to avoid this ontological commitment, Chrysippus understands the claim as conditional rather than existential in form (LS 301):

(A*) If something is a man, that thing is a rational mortal animal.

Although (A*), as one might argue, is identical in meaning to (A), (A*) does not make use of the abstract term Man, and if (A*) does not require the use of the abstract term Man, Chrysippus needn’t countenance any entity to which the term may refer in order to count (A*) to be true. And, since he takes the meaning of (A) and (A*) to be one and the same, he can take (A) to be true as well. Of course, there are propositions in addition to (A) that one might consider orthodox, which seem to make reference to abstract entities. Chrysippus is optimistic that a similar kind of paraphrase will apply, mutatis mutandis, to these.

Having argued that one need not posit the existence of universals to account for certain propositions of the orthodox variety, Chrysippus developed an argument in support of the claim that the Platonic account is unintelligible (LS 30 E):

Indeed, Chrysippus too raises problems as to whether the Idea will be called a certain this (tode ti)…Namely: if someone is in Athens, he is not in Megara; <but man is in Athens; therefore man is not in Megara>. For man is not someone, since the universal is not someone; but we took him as someone in the argument. And that is why the argument has this name, being called the ‘Not-someone’ argument.

The argument is a little impressionistic, but we might begin to reconstruct it as follows:

(1) If someone (or something) is in Athens, he (or it) is not in Megara.
(2) Man is in Athens.
So: (3) Man is not in Megara.

The argument seems to be a reductio ad absurdum built upon the idea that the Platonist will accept claims (1) and (2). The acceptance of (1) and (2), however, with an application of modus ponens, entails something the Platonist will not willingly accept. At this point, the Platonist might feel pushed to claim that Man is not to be classified by the terms, that is, someone or something, in the first premise. This, however, comes dangerously close to conceding a point to which the Platonist is not entitled, that is, Man is not something. Perhaps a more appealing move for the Platonist would be to give up (1) maintaining that universals are something, and that they are things that may be found in objects that are in different places, such as Athens and Megara, at the same time. This of course flushes out the very queer nature of universals. It seems that countenancing universals countenances entities that may be located simultaneously in a number of places, if they are located at all. It is, of course, open to the Platonist to argue that the properties in question do not exist in space, so it is a mistake to say that they are ‘located’ in a number of places at the same time.

c. The Growing Argument

As Long and Sedley argue, the fourfold ontological distinction seems to have emerged in response to Academic criticism, and Chrysippus seems to have been the central respondent (172). The Academics had made use of an argument known as the Growing Argument, which is traced to the fifth-century comic poet named Epicharmus, in order to generate skepticism with respect to the idea that an organism may endure, or exist diachronically (LS 28A). The argument begins by making use of an analogy that may be adapted to suit our purposes as follows: Suppose that I have a stack of pennies in my garage on Tuesday, and I remove one of the pennies on Wednesday. The resultant stack of pennies in my garage is, arguably, not the same stack that was in my garage on Tuesday, but a new stack altogether. To drive the idea home, we might suppose that the stack is not composed, as it were, of pennies, but rather of fifty dollar bills. Suppose I promise Helena, on Tuesday, that she may have the stack of bills provided that she cleans the garage. Were I to remove one of the fifties before giving her the stack, she can fairly protest that I did not give her the same stack I had promised her. The moral to glean, then, is that when it comes to stacks or lumps, the removal (or addition) of one (or more) of the constituents results in the destruction of the old (or the generation of a new) lump or stack. As the Academics were inclined to point out, on the Stoic view, people are composed entirely of matter. And who can deny that in, say, drinking a cup of coffee, or a glass of wine, there is an influx (and later there will be an efflux) of material constituents? What is more, work central to Stoic cosmology involved the study of natural processes. Where growth and decay are among the most fundamental of these, the Academics challenged the idea that any coherent account may here be provided (Sedley 1982, 258).

Those who are familiar with John Locke’s treatment of diachronic identity, in The Essay Concerning Human Understanding, will spot a certain resemblance in Chrysippus’s response. For Chrysippus seems to believe that a single object may, under different descriptions, have incompatible properties ascribed thereto (Sedley 1982, 259). Under the description ‘this lump of matter’, one’s identity may change continually from one moment to the next. Under the description ‘this person’, this need not be the case. For Chrysippus, moreover, a thing’s constitutive matter is a hupokeimenon. And, as a substrate, as Chrysippus concedes, things do not exist diachronically. Nevertheless, lumps of matter possess unique sets of qualities, and may be classified under the second category of the Stoic ontology. These items can be said to be idiõs poioi, ‘peculiarly qualifieds’, which can indeed endure through time. It is in this way that living things are said to exist diachronically.

Having disarmed the Growing Argument in this way, Chrysippus seems to have taken his case on the offensive. The text we have to work with derives from Philo of Alexandria:

Chrysippus, the most distinguished member of their school, in his work On the Growing Argument, creates a freak of the following kind. Having first established that it is possible for two peculiarly qualified individuals to occupy the same substance jointly, he says: “For the sake of argument, let one individual be thought of as whole-limbed; the other as minus one foot. Let the whole-limbed one be called Dion, the defective one Theon. Then let one of Dion’s feet be amputated…”

Chrysippus’ thought-experiment here bears a striking resemblance to a more modern puzzle that has been discussed by David Wiggins (1968): consider a cat by the name of Tibbles, and focus for the moment on that portion of Tibbles that includes everything save Tibbles tale. Designate the portion that includes everything but Tibbles’ tale with the name Tib. Tibbles and Tib, heretofore, do not occupy the same space at the same time. Thus, Tibbles and Tib are not identical. Suppose, however, that we amputate Tibbles’ tale. Tibbles and Tib now occupy the same region of space. If Tibbles is still a cat, it will be difficult to discern a criterion by which one could deny that Tib is a cat. Nevertheless, Tibbles and Tib are distinct individuals as they have had different histories. Hence, two cats occupy, and of course don’t occupy (so runs the reductio), the same place. And the puzzle, for Wiggins, is to see where the reasoning has gone astray. Chrysippus’ puzzle is very similar: Dion and Theon are said to occupy the same substance (rather than the same space), and where Dion has a right foot, Theon lacks one. However, when Dion’s foot is amputated, Chrysippus’s approach is not that of considering the conclusion to be validly derived from faulty premises. Instead, Chrysippus rejects the idea that Theon continues to exist. By all appearances, Chrysippus seems to have argued that after the amputation, when a bystander poses the question ‘Whose foot has been severed?’ the only intelligible answer is: that of Dion. As Theon could not have lost a foot he never had, and whoever is being bandaged there just lost a foot, Dion is the better candidate for survival. Of course, the paradox cannot be said to be constructed on Stoic premises. Sedley argues that Chrysippus turns the Growing Argument back on the Academics by showing that although they assume that material growth and diminution are fatal to the idea of an enduring entity, diminution is indeed part of the condition of Dion’s enduring, while the undiminished, unchanged Theon is the one who perishes (1982, 270).

d. Freedom and Necessity

Providence plays the leading role in Stoic cosmology. An instance of causation is, after all, the operation of the active principle, namely god, on that which is passive or inert. This providence gives way, for Chrysippus, to an outlook on the cosmos that is very deterministic (SVF2.1000).

In On Providence book 4, Chrysippus says that fate is a certain natural, everlasting ordering of the whole: one set of things follows and succeeds another, and the interconnection is inviolable.

Chrysippus’s deterministic outlook invites the following question: If the cosmos is ordered in a deterministic fashion, and we are part of it, then it would seem that we are ordered in a deterministic fashion. Thus, our actions will follow the one upon the other in a succession where the nexus is never violable. And, if we may never deviate from the course ordered by fate, we never have the control to act otherwise. Chrysippus’s cosmology seems not to accommodate the view that we are sometimes morally responsible for our actions. Stoic philosophy is, however, a philosophy of moral rigor, so Chrysippus owes an answer. Epicurean philosophers maintained a minimal level of indeterminacy at the atomic level (De Rerum Natura 2.216). As we have seen, this option is not open to Chrysippus and, in any case, the indeterminacy view is not without difficulty. (As Hume argued in the Enquiry, one has no control over that which lacks a cause). The acceptance of determinism taken with an optimistic outlook concerning the possibility of free action suggests that Chrysippus countenances the latter as compatible with the former. Precisely how the two are going to be understood as compatible has, however, been the subject of some controversy.

One possibility for understanding Chrysippus’ view can be derived from the following text (Long and Sedley 62a):

They too [Zeno and Chrysippus] affirmed that everything is fated, with the following model: When a dog is tied to a cart, if it wants to follow it is pulled and follows, making its spontaneous act coincide with necessity, but if it does not want to follow it will be compelled in any case. So it is with men too: even if they do not want to, they will be compelled in any case to follow what is destined.

This passage has been interpreted in a variety of ways. One might understand the point to be as follows. The threat that fatalism or determinism poses for moral responsibility seems to enter with the idea that if we cannot act otherwise than we do, we are not free. But consider our dog Maddy, fettered as she is to her master’s cart. We may assume that she follows her master, who is pulling the cart, with a canine sense of alacrity, and that she would do so, in much the same way, even were she not tied to the cart. It seems that she freely follows her master when, nevertheless, she could not act otherwise. Read in this way, the passage is a counterexample to the claim that if one cannot act otherwise, one is not free.

Susanne Bobzien has argued that the simile was authored by neither Zeno nor Chrysippus, but instead has its source in the Roman Stoa, and although she does acknowledge that it is probably an interpretation of a number of verses belonging to Cleanthes (2001 354), she finds nothing in the passage that meets up with accommodating free will. The point of the passage, on her view, is simply that it is in vain that one revolts from what fate administers.

Another important passage for exegetes is the following:

For although assent cannot occur unless it is prompted by an impression, nevertheless, since it has that impression as its proximate, not its primary cause, Chrysippus wants it to have the rationale which I mentioned just now. He does not want assent, at least, to be able to occur without the stimulus of external force (for assent must be prompted by an impression). But he resorts to his cylinder and spinning-top; these cannot begin to move without a push; but once that has happened, he holds that it is thereafter through their own nature that the cylinder rolls and the top spins. “Hence”, he says, “just as the person who pushed the cylinder gave it its beginning of motion but not its capacity for rolling, likewise, although the impression encountered will print and, as it were, emblazon its appearance on the mind, assent will be in our power. And assent, just as we said in the case of the cylinder, although prompted from will, thereafter moves through its own force”.

The above passage is important in connection with Chrysippus’s epistemology, meeting up as it does with the issue of whether belief or acceptance is a voluntary process. But it may also hold a clue concerning Chrysippus’ account of free action in general. The idea seems to be that the cylinder needs to be pushed in order to be set in motion, and considerations of the Newtonian variety aside, the power to keep rolling is specific to its nature. And, just as the power to keep rolling is found in the nature of the cylinder, so too the power of assent or dissent issues from the agent’s power. Of course, one might object that one may have little to no control over the dispositions that drive one to assent or dissent. And, if one doesn’t haven’t any control over certain antecedent events, that necessitate certain other events, then it seems that one doesn’t have any control over the subsequent events either. That this latter claim is true is not obvious however (McKay and Johnson 1996): Suppose with fair dice I roll snake eyes. From this fact, it follows by necessity that I am playing dice. But does it follow that my playing dice was not up to me? I certainly cannot roll snake eyes without playing dice. But is my playing dice necessitated in the same way? Perhaps the way is unimpeded for Chrysippus to make use of a similar kind of reasoning in his account of free action.

6. Ethics

a. Eudaimonism

As Aristotle observed, although most people agree that happiness or eudaimonia is the goal of life, there is less agreement concerning just what happiness consists in (1095a17). The Stoics agree with Aristotle that living a happy life is the end for the sake of which all things are done, and that such an activity is not done for the sake of anything else (SVF 3.16). Having set eudaimonia or eu zên as the summum bonum, the Stoics are left with the task of indicating wherein happiness consists. And, for the Stoics, happiness consists in nothing other than virtue (De Finibus III.44):

We deem health to be deserving of a certain value, but we do not reckon it a good; at the same time we rate no value so highly as to place it above virtue. This is not the same view held by the Peripatetics, who are going to say that an action which is both moral (honesta) and without pain is more desirable than the same action with pain. We [Stoics] think otherwise.

Nothing, then, is valued more than virtue. One might take happiness to be of a higher value than virtue, as the former may be thought of as a means to the latter, but this would be a mistake, for it seems that Chrysippus was willing to simply identify the virtuous life and the happy life (LS 63h):

He (Chrysippus) maintains that vice is the essence of unhappiness, insisting in every book that he writes on ethics and physics that living viciously is identical to living unhappily.

Of course, in identifying happiness with virtue, Chrysippus is obligated to provide an account of virtue. Zeno, the founder of the school at the Stoa Poikilê, had maintained that the final end of life was to live consistently and harmoniously (SVFI.79). His successor, Cleanthes, understood living consistently and harmoniously as living consistently with nature (SVF3.12.) Chrysippus further explicated the idea with the following formulation: “To live in accordance with one’s experience of the things which come about by nature” (SVF1.12). But it is still unclear what living in accordance with nature means. Friedrich Nietzsche, a German philosopher of the 19^th century, attempted to parody the idea by saying:

According to nature you want to live? O you noble Stoics, what deceptive words these are…And supposing your imperative, “live according to nature,” meant at bottom as much as “living according to life”—how could you not do that? Why make a principle out of what you yourselves are and must be?

As we have seen, a fairly thorough determinism pervades the thought of the Stoics, and the course to understanding Chrysippus’s views on action is not without difficulty. So one might fairly ask the question: How might one not live according to nature? In order to understand what the Stoics have in mind, it is important to note that a recurring debate among philosophical circles in antiquity concerned whether what is good is so in virtue of nature (physis) or convention (nomos). As Aristotle points out in the Nichomachean Ethics, there is such diversity among opinions concerning which actions are just that they are thought to exist according to convention rather than nature (1094b 14-16). So, living in conformity with nature or with what is good by nature, contrasts with living in accordance with mere opinion, or convention, concerning what is good. Now, when Chrysippus says, one ought to live in accordance with one’s experience of the things which come about by nature, there is some reason for thinking the nature he has in mind is the nature that is peculiar to human beings. The proprium or nature of the human species is the use of reason. So it seems that Chrysippus’s position is that the man who lives in accordance with reason lives in accordance with virtue. This is a position that enjoys some popularity and that rings reminiscent of Aristotle’s in Nichomachean Ethics. The problem of accounting for free action has not, thus, been cleared away. Nor has the gap between is and ought, hereby, closed. But the imperative ‘live according to nature’ may simply mean ‘live according to your nature qua human being by living in accordance with reason’. And, as an account of virtue, this view had a few considerations in its favor.

b. The Unity of Virtues

Although Chrysippus’s views on virtue share a great deal with those of Aristotle, another clear similarity concerns the connections that Chrysippus and Socrates found to obtain among the cardinal virtues. Socrates seems to have thought that virtues may be reduced to one thing (Protagoras 361a-b), namely, the ability to discern good from evil. In the Laches, for example, it is suggested that courage may be reduced to wisdom by arguing that courage is the knowledge of what inspires fear and confidence. That which issues in fear is evil, and that which inspires confidence is good. Courage is, so the argument goes, knowledge of what is good and what is evil (198b2-199e). Arguments similar in kind reduce the other virtues to knowledge of good and evil, and Chrysippus seems to have retained Socrates’s line of thinking. Prudence is the knowledge of things to be chosen; temperance is the knowledge, for example, of that for which one must be resolute (SVF3.95). Of course, understanding virtue as reducible, in some way, to knowledge dovetails nicely with the idea that virtue is living in accordance with reason.

It is usually thought that the source of knowledge requisite for virtue, according to Chrysippus, is the study of natural philosophy. However, in recent years there has been some debate concerning whether or not the science of ethics, according to Zeno, Cleanthes, and Chrysippus depends crucially upon claims about the nature of the cosmos. A number of scholars now believe that the founders of Stoic philosophy should be freed from the interpretation that ethics relies heavily upon a cosmology that is un- controversially providential. Julia Annas, for example, finds it hard to swallow the idea that ethics depends on cosmology as it “…lead[s] us…to accept counterintuitive conclusions such as nothing but vice is bad, and that emotions like regret are all mistaken”. Accepting the view, however, that the Stoics did not think ethics inextricably tied to physics has its own set of counterintuitive consequences, for it becomes difficult to take them at their word in more than a few key texts. The following is taken from Plutarch (admittedly not the most charitable reader of Stoicism), from his De Stoicorum Repugnantis (LS 60A):

Again in his Physical Postulates, [Chrysippus] says, “There is no other or more appropriate way of approaching the theory of good and bad things or the virtues or happiness than from universal nature (koinê physis), and from the administration of the world”. And later: “For the theory of good and bad, things must be attached to these, since there in no other starting point or reference for them that is better, and physical speculation (physika theoria) is to be adopted for no other purpose than for the differentiation of good and bad things”.

A straightforward reading of Plutarch’s quotation here—this is the reading, for example, of Long and Sedley (LS 374)—is that an account of the rational and providential features of god, which pervade the natural world, are indispensable when determining that which constitutes the good of man. Read in this way, Chrysippus comes across as a teleologist countenancing the good, the scientific, and the pious lives to be one and the same.

7. References and Further Reading

The following lists some important work that has been done on Chrysippus and Stoic philosophy. It is not intended to be a comprehensive bibliography.

a. Primary Sources

Stoicorum Veterum Fragmenta in Four Volumes (Leipzig: Teubner, 1903-1924)
- This work, originally compiled by Hans von Arnim, consisted of three volumes of testimonia and fragments intended for individuals with a background in Latin and Greek literature. Volume one contains fragments relating to Zeno and his followers. Volume two contains fragments related to Chrysippus’s logical and natural philosophy. The third volume contains material related to Chrysippus’s ethical philosophy. A fourth volume containing general indices was added in 1924 by Maximillian Adler.
The Hellenistic philosophers, Volume 1: Translations of the Principal Sources, with Philo-Sophical Commentary, by A.A. Long and D.N. Sedley, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1987.
- This work is probably indispensable for anyone interested in Hellenistic philosophy. It contains English translations and astute commentary. An accompanying volume contains the Greek and Latin texts from which the translations are derived.

b. Secondary Sources

Josiah B. Gould, The Philosophy of Chrysippus, Albany, SUNY Press, 1970.
- This is one of the few monographs limited to discerning the thought of Chrysippus. It is a common starting point for exegetes interested in Chrysippus’s influence on Stoicism.
Susanne Bobzien, Determinism and Freedom in Stoic Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001.
- Although this work treats the issue of free action in Stoic thought in general, there is a great deal that focuses upon Chrysippus’s views specifically. A number of other articles by Bobzien, including the following, will also be rewarding:
Susanne Bobzien, ‘Chrysippus and the Epistemic Theory of Vagueness’, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 102 (2002), 217-38.
Susanne Bobzien,‘Chrysippus’s Theory of Causes’, Topics in Stoic Philosophy, ed. K. Ierodiakonou, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999, 196-242.
Susanne Bobzien, ‘Logic’, Cambridge Companion to the Stoics, ed. Brad Inwood, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003, 85-123.
J. Bowin, ‘Chrysippus’s Puzzle about Identity’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 24 (2003), 239-251.
God and Cosmos in Stoicism, ed. Ricardo Salles Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2009.
- Readers interested in questions concerning nature, and how humans fit therein, will find a number of interesting essays in God and Cosmos. Recent interest in how humans fit into the environment has issued an interest in the Stoic conception of how humans fit into nature. Several of the essays in this work treat primarily Chrysippus’s views.

c. Other References

Annas, J. ‘Ethics in Stoic Philosophy’, Phronesis, 52, 58-87.
Caston, V. ‘Something and Nothing: The Stoics on Concepts and Universals’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 17, 145-213.
Grabowski, F. Plato, Metaphysics and the Forms. Continuum Studies in Ancient Philosophy, New York/London: Continuum, 2008.
McKay, Thomas and David Johnson (1996). “A Reconsideration of an Argument against Compatibilism”, Philosophical Topics 24: 113-122.
Nietzsche, F. Beyond Good and Evil, in Basic Writings of Nietzsche, tr. and ed. Walter Kaufmann, New York: Modern Library, 1992: 205.

Author Information

Jeremy Kirby
Email: jkirby@albion.edu
Albion College
U. S. A.

Immortality

Immortality is the indefinite continuation of a person’s existence, even after death. In common parlance, immortality is virtually indistinguishable from afterlife, but philosophically speaking, they are not identical. Afterlife is the continuation of existence after death, regardless of whether or not that continuation is indefinite. Immortality implies a never-ending existence, regardless of whether or not the body dies (as a matter of fact, some hypothetical medical technologies offer the prospect of a bodily immortality, but not an afterlife).

Immortality has been one of mankind’s major concerns, and even though it has been traditionally mainly confined to religious traditions, it is also important to philosophy. Although a wide variety of cultures have believed in some sort of immortality, such beliefs may be reduced to basically three non-exclusive models: (1) the survival of the astral body resembling the physical body; (2) the immortality of the immaterial soul (that is an incorporeal existence); (3) resurrection of the body (or re-embodiment, in case the resurrected person does not keep the same body as at the moment of death). This article examines philosophical arguments for and against the prospect of immortality.

A substantial part of the discussion on immortality touches upon the fundamental question in the philosophy of mind: do souls exist? Dualists believe souls do exist and survive the death of the body; materialists believe mental activity is nothing but cerebral activity and thus death brings the total end of a person’s existence. However, some immortalists believe that, even if immortal souls do not exist, immortality may still be achieved through resurrection.

Discussions on immortality are also intimately related to discussions of personal identity because any account of immortality must address how the dead person could be identical to the original person that once lived. Traditionally, philosophers have considered three main criteria for personal identity: the soul criterion , the body criterion and the psychological criterion.

Although empirical science has little to offer here, the field of parapsychology has attempted to offer empirical evidence in favor of an afterlife. More recently, secular futurists envision technologies that may suspend death indefinitely (such as Strategies for Engineered Negligible Senescence, and mind uploading), thus offering a prospect for a sort of bodily immortality.

Semantic Problems
Three Models of Immortality
Pragmatic Arguments for the Belief in Immortality
Plato’s Arguments for Immortality
Dualism
A Brief Digression: Criteria for Personal Identity
Problems with the Resurrection of the Body
Parapsychology
The Technological Prospect of Immortality
References and Further Reading

1. Semantic Problems

Discourse on immortality bears a semantic difficulty concerning the word ‘death’. We usually define it in physiological terms as the cessation of biological functions that make life possible. But, if immortality is the continuation of life even after death, a contradiction appears to come up (Rosemberg, 1998). For apparently it makes no sense to say that someone has died and yet survived death. To be immortal is, precisely, not to suffer death. Thus, whoever dies, stops existing; nobody may exist after death, precisely because death means the end of existence.

For convenience, however, we may agree that ‘death’ simply means the decomposition of the body, but not necessarily the end of a person’s existence, as assumed in most dictionary definitions. In such a manner, a person may ‘die’ in as much as their body no longer exists (or, to be more precise, no longer holds vital signs: pulse, brain activity, and so forth), but may continue to exist, either in an incorporeal state, with an ethereal body, or with some other physical body.

Some people may think of ‘immortality’ in vague and general terms, such as the continuity of a person’s deeds and memories among their friends and relatives. Thus, baseball player Babe Ruth is immortal in a very vague sense: he is well remembered among his fans. But, philosophically speaking, immortality implies the continuation of personal identity. Babe Ruth may be immortal in the sense that he is well remembered, but unless there is someone that may legitimately claim “I am Babe Ruth,” we shall presume Babe Ruth no longer exists and hence, is not immortal.

2. Three Models of Immortality

Despite the immense variety of beliefs on immortality, they may be reduced to three basic models: the survival of the astral body, the immaterial soul and resurrection (Flew, 2000). These models are not necessarily mutually exclusive; in fact, most religions have adhered to a combination of them.

a. The Survival of the Astral Body

Much primitive religious thought conceives that human beings are made up of two body substances: a physical body, susceptible of being touched, smelt, heard and seen; and an astral body made of some sort of mysterious ethereal substance. Unlike the physical body, the astral body has no solidity (it can go through walls, for example.) and hence, it cannot be touched, but it can be seen. Its appearance is similar to the physical body, except perhaps its color tonalities are lighter and its figure is fuzzier.

Upon death, the astral body detaches itself from the physical body, and mourns in some region within time and space. Thus, even if the physical body decomposes, the astral body survives. This is the type of immortality most commonly presented in films and literature (for example, Hamlet’s ghost). Traditionally, philosophers and theologians have not privileged this model of immortality, as there appears to be two insurmountable difficulties: 1) if the astral body does exist, it should be seen depart from the physical body at the moment of death; yet there is no evidence that accounts for it; 2) ghosts usually appear with clothes; this would imply that, not only are there astral bodies, but also astral clothes – a claim simply too extravagant to be taken seriously (Edwards, 1997: 21).

b. The Immaterial Soul

The model of the immortality of the soul is similar to the ‘astral body’ model, in as much as it considers that human beings are made up of two substances. But, unlike the ‘astral body’ model, this model conceives that the substance that survives the death of the body is not a body of some other sort, but rather, an immaterial soul. In as much as the soul is immaterial, it has no extension, and thus, it cannot be perceived through the senses. A few philosophers, such as Henry More, have come to believe that for something to exist, it must occupy space (although not necessarily physical space), and hence, souls are located somewhere in space (Henry, 2007). Up until the twentieth century, the majority of philosophers believed that persons are souls, and that human beings are made up of two substances (soul and body). A good portion of philosophers believed that the body is mortal and the soul is immortal. Ever since Descartes in the seventeenth century, most philosophers have considered that the soul is identical to the mind, and, whenever a person dies, their mental contents survive in an incorporeal state.

Eastern religions (for example, Hinduism and Buddhism) and some ancient philosophers (for example, Pythagoras and Plato) believed that immortal souls abandon the body upon death, may exist temporarily in an incorporeal state, and may eventually adhere to a new body at the time of birth (in some traditions, at the time of fertilization). This is the doctrine of reincarnation.

c. The Resurrection of the Body

Whereas most Greek philosophers believed that immortality implies solely the survival of the soul, the three great monotheistic religions (Judaism, Christianity and Islam) consider that immortality is achieved through the resurrection of the body at the time of the Final Judgment. The very same bodies that once constituted persons shall rise again, in order to be judged by God. None of these great faiths has a definite position on the existence of an immortal soul. Therefore, traditionally, Jews, Christians and Muslims have believed that, at the time of death, the soul detaches from the body and continues on to exist in an intermediate incorporeal state until the moment of resurrection. Some others, however, believe that there is no intermediate state: with death, the person ceases to exist, and in a sense, resumes existence at the time of resurrection.

As we shall see, some philosophers and theologians have postulated the possibility that, upon resurrection, persons do not rise with the very same bodies with which they once lived (rather, resurrected persons would be constituted by a replica). This version of the doctrine of the resurrection would be better referred to as ‘re-embodiment’: the person dies, but, as it were, is ‘re-embodied’.

3. Pragmatic Arguments for the Belief in Immortality

Most religions adhere to the belief in immortality on the basis of faith. In other words, they provide no proof of the survival of the person after the death of the body; actually, their belief in immortality appeals to some sort of divine revelation that, allegedly, does not require rationalization.

Natural theology, however, attempts to provide rational proofs of God’s existence. Some philosophers have argued that, if we can rationally prove that God exists, then we may infer that we are immortal. For, God, being omnibenevolent, cares about us, and thus would not allow the annihilation of our existence; and being just, would bring about a Final Judgement (Swinburne, 1997). Thus, the traditional arguments in favor of the existence of God (ontological, cosmological, teleological) would indirectly prove our immortality. However, these traditional arguments have been notoriously criticized, and some arguments against the existence of God have also been raised (such as the problem of evil) (Martin, 1992; Smith, 1999).

Nevertheless, some philosophers have indeed tried to rationalize the doctrine of immortality, and have come up with a few pragmatic arguments in its favor.

Blaise Pascal proposed a famous argument in favor of the belief in the existence of God, but it may well be extended to the belief in immortality (Pascal, 2005). The so-called ‘Pascal’s Wager’ argument goes roughly as follows: if we are to decide to believe whether God exists or not, it is wiser to believe that God does exist. If we rightly believe that God exists, , we gain eternal bliss; if God does not exist, we lose nothing, in as much as there is no Final Judgment to account for our error. On the other hand, if we rightly believe God does not exist, we gain nothing, in as much as there is no Final Judgment to reward our belief. But, if we wrongly believe that God does not exist, we lose eternal bliss, and are therefore damned to everlasting Hell. By a calculation of risks and benefits, we should conclude that it is better to believe in God’s existence. This argument is easily extensible to the belief in immortality: it is better to believe that there is a life after death, because if in fact there is a life after death, we shall be rewarded for our faith, and yet lose nothing if we are wrong; on the other hand, if we do not believe in a life after death, and we are wrong, we will be punished by God, and if we are right, there will not be a Final Judgment to reward our belief.

Although this argument has remained popular among some believers, philosophers have identified too many problems in it (Martin, 1992). Pascal’s Wager does not take into account the risk of believing in a false god (What if Baal were the real God, instead of the Christian God?), or the risk of believing in the wrong model of immortality (what if God rewarded belief in reincarnation, and punished belief in resurrection?). The argument also assumes that we are able to choose our beliefs, something most philosophers think very doubtful.

Other philosophers have appealed to other pragmatic benefits of the belief in immortality. Immanuel Kant famously rejected in his Critique of Pure Reason the traditional arguments in favor of the existence of God; but in his Critique of Practical Reason he put forth a so-called ‘moral argument’. The argument goes roughly as follows: belief in God and immortality is a prerequisite for moral action; if people do not believe there is a Final Judgment administered by God to account for deeds, there will be no motivation to be good. In Kant’s opinion, human beings seek happiness. But in order for happiness to coincide with moral action, the belief in an afterlife is necessary, because moral action does not guarantee happiness. Thus, the only way that a person may be moral and yet preserve happiness, is by believing that there will be an afterlife justice that will square morality with happiness. Perhaps Kant’s argument is more eloquently expressed in Ivan Karamazov’s (a character from Dostoevsky’s The Brothers Karamazov) famous phrase: “If there is no God, then everything is permitted… if there is no immortality, there is no virtue”.

The so-called ‘moral argument’ has been subject to some criticism. Many philosophers have argued that it is indeed possible to construe secular ethics, where appeal to God is unnecessary to justify morality. The question “why be moral?” may be answered by appealing to morality itself, to the need for cooperation, or simply, to one’s own pleasure (Singer, 1995; Martin, 1992). A vigilant God does not seem to be a prime need in order for man to be good. If these philosophers are right, the lack of belief in immortality would not bring about the collapse of morality. Some contemporary philosophers, however, align with Kant and believe that secular morality is shallow, as it does not satisfactorily account for acts of sacrifice that go against self-interest; in their view, the only way to account for such acts is by appealing to a Divine Judge (Mavrodes, 1995).

Yet another pragmatic argument in favor of the belief in immortality appeals to the need to find meaning in life. Perhaps Miguel de Unamuno’s Del sentimiento tràgico de la vida is the most emblematic philosophical treatise advocating this argument: in Unamuno’s opinion, belief in immortality is irrational, but nevertheless necessary to avoid desperation in the face of life’s absurdity. Only by believing that our lives will have an ever-lasting effect, do we find motivation to continue to live. If, on the contrary, we believe that everything will ultimately come to an end and nothing will survive, it becomes pointless to carry on any activity.

Of course, not all philosophers would agree. Some philosophers would argue that, on the contrary, the awareness that life is temporal and finite makes living more meaningful, in as much as we better appreciate opportunities (Heidegger, 1978). Bernard Williams has argued that, should life continue indefinitely, it would be terribly boring, and therefore, pointless (Williams, 1976). Some philosophers, however, counter that some activities may be endlessly repeated without ever becoming boring; furthermore, a good God would ensure that we never become bored in Heaven (Fischer, 2009).

Death strikes fear and anguish in many of us, and some philosophers argue that the belief in immortality is a much needed resource to cope with that fear. But, Epicurus famously argued that it is not rational to fear death, for two main reasons: 1) in as much as death is the extinction of consciousness, we are not aware of our condition (“if death is, I am not; if I am, death is not”); 2) in the same manner that we do not worry about the time that has passed before we were born, we should not worry about the time that will pass after we die (Rist, 1972).

At any rate, pragmatic arguments in favor of the belief in immortality are also critiqued on the grounds that the pragmatic benefits of a belief bear no implications on its truth. In other words, the fact that a belief is beneficial does not make it true. In the analytic tradition, philosophers have long argued for and against the pragmatic theory of truth, and depending on how this theory is valued, it will offer a greater or lesser plausibility to the arguments presented above.

4. Plato’s Arguments for Immortality

Plato was the first philosopher to argue, not merely in favor of the convenience of accepting the belief in immortality, but for the truth of the belief itself. His Phaedo is a dramatic representation of Socrates’ final discussion with his disciples, just before drinking the hemlock. Socrates shows no sign of fear or concern, for he is certain that he will survive the death of his body. He presents three main arguments to support his position, and some of these arguments are still in use today.

First, Socrates appeals to cycles and opposites. He believes that everything has an opposite that is implied by it. And, as in cycles, things not only come from opposites, but also go towards opposites. Thus, when something is hot, it was previously cold; or when we are awake, we were previously asleep; but when we are asleep, we shall be awake once again. In the same manner, life and death are opposites in a cycle. Being alive is opposite to being dead. And, in as much as death comes from life, life must come from death. We come from death, and we go towards death. But, again, in as much as death comes from life, it will also go towards life. Thus, we had a life before being born, and we shall have a life after we die.

Most philosophers have not been persuaded by this argument. It is very doubtful that everything has an opposite (What is the opposite of a computer?) And, even if everything had an opposite, it is doubtful that everything comes from its opposite, or even that everything goes towards its opposite.

Socrates also appeals to the theory of reminiscence, the view that learning is really a process of ‘remembering’ knowledge from past lives. The soul must already exist before the birth of the body, because we seem to know things that were not available to us. Consider the knowledge of equality. If we compare two sticks and we realize they are not equal, we form a judgment on the basis of a previous knowledge of ‘equality’ as a form. That knowledge must come from previous lives. Therefore, this is an argument in favor of the transmigration of souls (that is, reincarnation or metempsychosis).

Some philosophers would dispute the existence of the Platonic forms, upon which this argument rests. And, the existence of innate ideas does not require the appeal to previous lives. Perhaps we are hard-wired by our brains to believe certain things; thus, we may know things that were not available to us previously.

Yet another of Socrates’ arguments appeals to the affinity between the soul and the forms. In Plato’s understanding, forms are perfect, immaterial and eternal. And, in as much as the forms are intelligible, but not sensible, only the soul can apprehend them. In order to apprehend something, the thing apprehending must have the same nature as the thing apprehended. The soul, then, shares the attributes of the forms: it is immaterial and eternal, and hence, immortal.

Again, the existence of the Platonic forms should not be taken for granted, and for this reason, this is not a compelling argument. Furthermore, it is doubtful that the thing apprehending must have the same nature as the thing apprehended: a criminologist need not be a criminal in order to apprehend the nature of crime.

5. Dualism

Plato’s arguments take for granted that souls exist; he only attempts to prove that they are immortal. But, a major area of discussion in the philosophy of mind is the existence of the soul. One of the doctrines that hold that the soul does exist is called ‘dualism’; its name comes from the fact that it postulates that human beings are made up of two substances: body and soul. Arguments in favor of dualism are indirectly arguments in favor of immortality, or at least in favor of the possibility of survival of death. For, if the soul exists, it is an immaterial substance. And, in as much as it is an immaterial substance, it is not subject to the decomposition of material things; hence, it is immortal.

Most dualists agree that the soul is identical to the mind, yet different from the brain or its functions. Some dualists believe the mind may be some sort of emergent property of the brain: it depends on the brain, but it is not identical to the brain or its processes. This position is often labeled ‘property dualism’, but here we are concerned with substance dualism, that is, the doctrine that holds that the mind is a separate substance (and not merely a separate property) from the body, and therefore, may survive the death of the body (Swinburne, 1997).

a. Descartes’ Arguments for Dualism

René Descartes is usually considered the father of dualism, as he presents some very ingenuous arguments in favor of the existence of the soul as a separate substance (Descartes, 1980). In perhaps his most celebrated argument, Descartes invites a thought experiment: imagine you exist, but not your body. You wake up in the morning, but as you approach the mirror, you do not see yourself there. You try to reach your face with your hand, but it is thin air. You try to scream, but no sound comes out. And so on.

Now, Descartes believes that it is indeed possible to imagine such a scenario. But, if one can imagine the existence of a person without the existence of the body, then persons are not constituted by their bodies, and hence, mind and body are two different substances. If the mind were identical to the body, it would be impossible to imagine the existence of the mind without imagining at the same time the existence of the body.

This argument has been subject to much scrutiny. Dualists certainly believe it is a valid one, but it is not without its critics. Descartes seems to assume that everything that is imaginable is possible. Indeed, many philosophers have long agreed that imagination is a good guide as to what is possible (Hume, 2010). But, this criterion is disputed. Imagination seems to be a psychological process, and thus not strictly a logical process. Therefore, perhaps we can imagine scenarios that are not really possible. Consider the Barber Paradox. At first, it seems possible that, in a town, a man shaves only those persons that shave themselves. We may perhaps imagine such a situation, but logically there cannot be such a situation, as Bertrand Russell showed. The lesson to be learned is that imagination might not be a good guide to possibility. And, although Descartes appears to have no trouble imagining an incorporeal mind, such a scenario might not be possible. However, dualists may argue that there is no neat difference between a psychological and a logical process, as logic seems to be itself a psychological process.

Descartes presents another argument. As Leibniz would later formalize in the Principle of Identity of Indiscernibles, two entities can be considered identical, if and only if, they exhaustively share the same attributes. Descartes exploits this principle, and attempts to find a property of the mind not shared by the body (or vice versa), in order to argue that they are not identical, and hence, are separate substances.

Descartes states: “There is a great difference between a mind and a body, because the body, by its very nature, is something divisible, whereas the mind is plainly indivisible. . . insofar as I am only a thing that thinks, I cannot distinguish any parts in me. . . . Although the whole mind seems to be united to the whole body, nevertheless, were a foot or an arm or any other bodily part amputated, I know that nothing would be taken away from the mind” (Descartes, 1980: 97).

Descartes believed, then, that mind and body cannot be the same substance. Descartes put forth another similar argument: the body has extension in space, and as such, it can be attributed physical properties. We may ask, for instance, what the weight of a hand is, or what the longitude of a leg is. But the mind has no extension, and therefore, it has no physical properties. It makes no sense to ask what the color of the desire to eat strawberries is, or what the weight of Communist ideology is. If the body has extension, and the mind has no extension, then the mind can be considered a separate substance.

Yet another of Descartes’ arguments appeals to some difference between mind and body. Descartes famously contemplated the possibility that an evil demon might be deceiving him about the world. Perhaps the world is not real. In as much as that possibility exists, Descartes believed that one may be doubt the existence of one’s own body. But, Descartes argued that one cannot doubt the existence of one’s own mind. For, if one doubts, one is thinking; and if one thinks, then it can be taken for certain that one’s mind exists. Hence Descartes famous phrase: “cogito ergo sum”, I think, therefore, I exist. Now, if one may doubt the existence of one’s body, but cannot doubt the existence of one’s mind, then mind and body are different substances. For, again, they do not share exhaustively the same attributes.

These arguments are not without critics. Indeed, Leibniz’s Principle of Indiscernibles would lead us to think that, in as much as mind and body do not exhaustively share the same properties, they cannot be the same substance. But, in some contexts, it seems possible that A and B may be identical, even if that does not imply that everything predicated of A can be predicated of B.

Consider, for example, a masked man that robs a bank. If we were to ask a witness whether or not the masked man robbed the bank, the witness will answer “yes!”. But, if we were to ask the witness whether his father robbed the bank, he may answer “no”. That, however, does not imply that the witness’ father is not the bank robber: perhaps the masked man was the witness’ father, and the witness was not aware of it. This is the so-called ‘Masked Man Fallacy’.

This case forces us to reconsider Leibniz’s Law: A is identical to B, not if everything predicated of A is predicated of B, but rather, when A and B share exhaustively the same properties. And, what people believe about substances are not properties. To be an object of doubt is not, strictly speaking, a property, but rather, an intentional relation. And, in our case, to be able to doubt the body’s existence, but not the mind’s existence, does not imply that mind and body are not the same substance.

b. More Recent Dualist Arguments

In more recent times, Descartes’ strategy has been used by other dualist philosophers to account for the difference between mind and body. Some philosophers argue that the mind is private, whereas the body is not. Any person may know the state of my body, but no person, including even possibly myself, can truly know the state of my mind.

Some philosophers point ‘intentionality’ as another difference between mind and body. The mind has intentionality, whereas the body does not. Thoughts are about something, whereas body parts are not. In as much as thoughts have intentionality, they may also have truth values. Not all thoughts, of course, are true or false, but at least those thoughts that pretend to represent the world, may be. On the other hand, physical states do not have truth values: neurons activating in the brain are neither ‘true’, nor ‘false’.

Again, these arguments exploit the differences between mind and body. But, very much as with Descartes’ arguments, it is not absolutely clear that they avoid the Masked Man Fallacy.

c. Arguments against Dualism

Opponents of dualism not only reject their arguments; they also highlight conceptual and empirical problems with this doctrine. Most opponents of dualism are materialists: they believe that mental stuff is really identical to the brain, or at the most, an epiphenomenon of the brain. Materialism limits the prospects for immortality: if the mind is not a separate substance from the brain, then at the time of the brain’s death, the mind also becomes extinct, and hence, the person does not survive death. Materialism need not undermine all expectations of immortality (see resurrection below), but it does undermine the immortality of the soul.

The main difficulty with dualism is the so-called ‘interaction problem’. If the mind is an immaterial substance, how can it interact with material substances? The desire to move my hand allegedly moves my hand, but how exactly does that occur? There seems to be an inconsistency with the mind’s immateriality: some of the time, the mind is immaterial and is not affected by material states, at other times, the mind manages to be in contact with the body and cause its movement. Daniel Dennett has ridiculed this inconsistency by appealing to the comic-strip character Casper. This friendly ghost is immaterial because he is able to go through walls. But, all of a sudden, he is also able to catch a ball. The same inconsistency appears with dualism: in its interaction with the body, sometimes the mind does not interact with the body, sometimes it does (Dennett, 1992).Dualists have offered some solutions to this problem. Occasionalists hold that God directly causes material events. Thus, mind and body never interact. Likewise, parallelists hold that mental and physical events are coordinated by God so that they appear to cause each other, but in fact, they do not. These alternatives are in fact rejected by most contemporary philosophers.

Some dualists, however, may reply that the fact that we cannot fully explain how body and soul interact, does not imply that interaction does not take place. We know many things happen in the universe, although we do not know how they happen. Richard Swinburne, for instance, argues as follows: “That bodily events cause brain events and that these cause pains, images, and beliefs (where their subjects have privileged access to the latter and not the former), is one of the most obvious phenomena of human experience. If we cannot explain how that occurs, we should not try to pretend that it does not occur. We should just acknowledge that human beings are not omniscient, and cannot understand everything” (Swinburne, 1997, xii).

On the other hand, Dualism postulates the existence of an incorporeal mind, but it is not clear that this is a coherent concept. In the opinion of most dualists, the incorporeal mind does perceive. But, it is not clear how the mind can perceive without sensory organs. Descartes seemed to have no problems in imagining an incorporeal existence, in his thought experiment. However, John Hospers, for instance, believes that such a scenario is simply not imaginable:

You see with eyes? No, you have no eyes, since you have no body. But let that pass for a moment; you have experiences similar to what you would have if you had eyes to see with. But how can you look toward the foot of the bed or toward the mirror? Isn’t looking an activity that requires having a body? How can you look in one direction or another if you have no head to turn? And this isn’t all; we said that you can’t touch your body because there is no body there; how did you discover this?… Your body seems to be involved in every activity we try to describe even though we have tried to imagine existing without it. (Hospers, 1997: 280)

Furthermore, even if an incorporeal existence were in fact possible, it could be terribly lonely. For, without a body, could it be possible to communicate with other minds. In Paul Edward’s words: “so far from living on in paradise, a person deprived of his body and thus of all sense organs would, quite aside from many other gruesome deprivations, be in a state of desolate loneliness and eventually come to prefer annihilation”. (Edwards, 1997:48). However, consider that, even in the absence of a body, great pleasures may be attained. We may live in a situation the material world is an illusion (in fact, idealists inspired in Berkley lean towards such a position), and yet, enjoy existence. For, even without a body, we may enjoy sensual pleasures that, although not real, certainly feel real. However, the problems with dualism do not end there. If souls are immaterial and have no spatial extension, how can they be separate from other souls? Separation implies extension. Yet, if the soul has no extension, it is not at all clear how one soul can be distinguished from another. Perhaps souls can be distinguished based on their contents, but then again, how could we distinguish two souls with exactly the same contents? Some contemporary dualists have responded thus: in as much as souls interact with bodies, they have a spatial relationships to bodies, and in a sense, can be individuated.

Perhaps the most serious objection to dualism, and a substantial argument in favor of materialism, is the mind’s correlation with the brain. Recent developments in neuroscience increasingly confirm that mental states depend upon brain states. Neurologists have been able to identify certain regions of the brain associated with specific mental dispositions. And, in as much as there appears to be a strong correlation between mind and brain, it seems that the mind may be reducible to the brain, and would therefore not be a separate substance.

In the last recent decades, neuroscience has accumulated data that confirm that cerebral damage has a great influence on the mental constitution of persons. Phineas Gage’s case is well-known in this respect: Gage had been a responsible and kind railroad worker, but had an accident that resulted in damage to the frontal lobes of his brain. Ever since, Gage turned into an aggressive, irresponsible person, unrecognizable by his peers (Damasio, 2006).

Departing from Gage’s case, scientists have inferred that frontal regions of the brain strongly determine personality. And, if mental contents can be severely damaged by brain injuries, it does not seem right to postulate that the mind is an immaterial substance. If, as dualism postulates, Gage had an immortal immaterial soul, why didn’t his soul remain intact after his brain injury?

A similar difficulty arises when we consider degenerative neurological diseases, such as Alzheimer’s disease. As it is widely known, this disease progressively eradicates the mental contents of patients, until patients lose memory almost completely. If most memories eventually disappear, what remains of the soul? When a patient afflicted with Alzheimer dies, what is it that survives, if precisely, most of his memories have already been lost? Of course, correlation is not identity, and the fact that the brain is empirically correlated with the mind does not imply that the mind is the brain. But, many contemporary philosophers of mind adhere to the so-called ‘identity theory’: mental states are the exact same thing as the firing of specific neurons.

Dualists may respond by claiming that the brain is solely an instrument of the soul. If the brain does not work properly, the soul will not work properly, but brain damage does not imply a degeneration of the soul. Consider, for example, a violinist. If the violin does not play accurately, the violinist will not perform well. But, that does not imply that the violinist has lost their talent. In the same manner, a person may have a deficient brain, and yet, retain her soul intact. However, Occam’s Razor requires the more parsimonious alternative: in which case, unless there is any compelling evidence in its favor, there is no need to assume the existence of a soul that uses the brain as its instrument.

Dualists may also suggest that the mind is not identical to the soul. In fact, whereas many philosophers tend to consider the soul and mind identical, various religions consider that a person is actually made up of by three substances: body, mind and soul. In such a view, even if the mind degenerates, the soul remains. However, it would be far from clear what the soul exactly could be, if it is not identical to the mind.

6. A Brief Digression: Criteria for Personal Identity

Any philosophical discussion on immortality touches upon a fundamental issue concerning persons–personal identity. If we hope to survive death, we would want to be sure that the person that continues to exist after death is the same person that existed before death. And, for religions that postulate a Final Judgment, this is a crucial matter: if God wants to apply justice, the person rewarded or punished in the afterlife must be the very same person whose deeds determine the outcome.

The question of personal identity refers to the criterion upon which a person remains the same (that is, numerical identity) throughout time. Traditionally, philosophers have discussed three main criteria: soul, body and psychological continuity.

a. The Soul Criterion

According to the soul criterion for personal identity, persons remains the same throughout time, if and only if, they retain their soul (Swinburne, 2004). Philosophers who adhere to this criterion usually do not think the soul is identical to the mind. The soul criterion is favored by very few philosophers, as it faces a huge difficulty: if the soul is an immaterial non-apprehensible substance (precisely, in as much as it is not identical to the mind), how can we be sure that a person continues to be the same? We simply do not know if, in the middle of the night, our neighbor’s soul has transferred into another body. Even if our neighbor’s body and mental contents remain the same, we can never know if his soul is the same. Under this criterion, it appears that there is simply no way to make sure someone is always the same person.

However, there is a considerable argument in favor of the soul criterion. To pursue such an argument, Richard Swinburne proposes the following thought experiment: suppose John’s brain is successfully split in two, and as a result, we get two persons; one with the left hemisphere of John’s brain, the other with the right hemisphere. Now, which one is John? Both have a part of John’s brain, and both conserve part of John’s mental contents. So, one of them must presumably be John, but which one? Unlike the body and the mind, the soul is neither divisible nor duplicable. Thus, although we do not know which would be John, we do know that only one of the two persons is John. And it would be the person that preserves John’s souls, even if we have no way of identifying it. In such a manner, although we know about John’s body and mind, we are not able to discern who is John; therefore, John’s identity is not his mind or his body, but rather, his soul (Swinburne, 2010: 68).

b. The Body Criterion

Common sense informs that persons are their bodies (in fact, that is how we recognize people ) but, although many philosophers would dispute this, ordinary people seem generally to adhere to such a view). Thus, under this criterion, a person continues to be the same, if, and only if, they conserve the same body. Of course, the body alters, and eventually, all of its cells are replaced. This evokes the ancient philosophical riddle known as the Ship of Theseus: the planks of Theseus’ ship were gradually replaced, until none of the originals remained. Is it still the same ship? There has been much discussion on this, but most philosophers agree that, in the case of the human body, the total replacement of atoms and the slight alteration of form do not alter the numerical identity of the human body.

However, the body criterion soon runs into difficulties. Imagine two patients, Brown and Robinson, who undergo surgery simultaneously. Accidentally, their brains are swapped in placed in the wrong body. Thus, Brown’s brain is placed in Robinson’s body. Let us call this person Brownson. Naturally, in as much as he has Brown’s brain, he will have Brown’s memories, mental contents, and so forth. Now, who is Brownson? Is he Robinson with Brown’s brain; or is he Brown with Robinson’s body? Most people would think the latter (Shoemaker, 2003). After all, the brain is the seat of consciousness.

Thus, it would appear that the body criterion must give way to the brain criterion: a person continues to be the same, if and only if, she conserves the same brain. But, again, we run into difficulties. What if the brain undergoes fission, and each half is placed in a new body? (Parfit, 1984). As a result, we would have two persons pretending to be the original person, but, because of the principle of transitivity, we know that both of them cannot be the original person. And, it seems arbitrary that one of them should be the original person, and not the other (although, as we have seen, Swinburne bites the bullet, and considers that, indeed, only one would be the original person). This difficulty invites the consideration of other criteria for personal identity.

c. The Psychological Criterion

John Locke famously asked what we would think if a prince one day woke up in a cobbler’s body, and the cobbler in a prince’s body (Locke, 2009). Although the cobbler’s peers would recognize him as the cobbler, he would have the memories of the prince. Now, if before that event, the prince committed a crime, who should be punished? Should it be the man in the palace, who remembers being a cobbler; or should it be the man in the workshop, who remembers being a prince, including his memory of the crime?

It seems that the man in the workshop should be punished for the prince’s crime, because, even if that is not the prince’s original body, that person is the prince, in as much as he conserves his memories. Locke, therefore, believed that a person continues to be the same, if and only if, she conserves psychological continuity.

Although it appears to be an improvement with regards to the previous two criteria, the psychological criterion also faces some problems. Suppose someone claims today to be Guy Fawkes, and conserves intact very vividly and accurately the memories of the seventeenth century conspirator (Williams, 1976). By the psychological criterion, such a person would indeed be Guy Fawkes. But, what if, simultaneously, another person also claims to be Guy Fawkes, even with the same degree of accuracy? Obviously, both persons cannot be Guy Fawkes. Again, it would seem arbitrary to conclude that one person is Guy Fawkes, yet the other person isn’t. It seems more plausible that neither person is Guy Fawkes, and therefore, that psychological continuity is not a good criterion for personal identity.

d. The Bundle Theory

In virtue of the difficulties with the above criteria, some philosophers have argued that, in a sense, persons do not exist. Or, to be more precise, the self does not endure changes. In David Hume’s words, a person is “nothing but a bundle or collection of different perceptions, which succeed each other with an inconceivable rapidity, and are in a perpetual flux and movement” (Hume, 2010: 178). This is the so-called ‘bundle theory of the self’.

As a corollary, Derek Parfit argues that, when considering survival, personal identity is not what truly matters (Parfit, 1984). What does matter is psychological continuity. Parfit asks us to consider this example.

Suppose that you enter a cubicle in which, when you press a button, a scanner records the states of all the cells in your brain and body, destroying both while doing so. This information is then transmitted at the speed of light to some other planet, where a replicator produces a perfect organic copy of you. Since the brain of your replica is exactly like yours, it will seem to remember living your life up to the moment when you pressed the button, its character will be just like yours, it will be every other way psychologically continuous with you. (Parfit, 1997: 311)

Now, under the psychological criterion, such a replica will in fact be you. But, what if the machine does not destroy the original body, or makes more than one replica? In such a case, there will be two persons claiming to be you. As we have seen, this is a major problem for the psychological criterion. But, Parfit argues that, even if the person replicated is not the same person that entered the cubicle, it is psychologically continuous. And, that is what is indeed relevant.

Parfit’s position has an important implication for discussions of immortality. According to this view, a person in the afterlife is not the same person that lived before. But, that should not concern us. We should be concerned about the prospect that, in the afterlife, there will at least be one person that is psychologically continuous with us.

7. Problems with the Resurrection of the Body

As we have seen, the doctrine of resurrection postulates that on Judgment Day the bodies of every person who ever lived shall rise again, in order to be judged by God. Unlike the doctrine of the immortality of the soul, the doctrine of resurrection has not been traditionally defended with philosophical arguments. Most of its adherents accept it on the basis of faith. Some Christians, however, consider that the resurrection of Jesus can be historically demonstrated (Habermas, 2002; Craig, 2008). And, so the argument goes, if it can be proven that God resurrected Jesus from the dead, then we can expect that God will do the same with every human being who has ever lived.

Nevertheless, the doctrine of resurrection runs into some philosophical problems derived from considerations on personal identity; that is, how is the person resurrected identical to the person that once lived? If we were to accept dualism and the soul criterion for personal identity, then there is not much of a problem: upon the moment of death, soul and body split, the soul remains incorporeal until the moment of resurrection, and the soul becomes attached to the new resurrected body. In as much as a person is the same, if and only if, she conserves the same soul, then we may legitimately claim that the resurrected person is identical to the person that once lived.

But, if we reject dualism, or the soul criterion for personal identity, then we must face some difficulties. According to the most popular one conception of resurrection, we shall be raised with the same bodies with which we once lived. Suppose that the resurrected body is in fact made of the very same cells that made up the original body, and also, the resurrected body has the same form as the original body. Are they identical?

Peter Van Inwagen thinks not (Van Inwagen, 1997). If, for example, an original manuscript written by Augustine is destroyed, and then, God miraculously recreates a manuscript with the same atoms that made up Augustine’s original manuscript, we should not consider it the very same manuscript. It seems that, between Augustine’s original manuscript, and the manuscript recreated by God, there is no spatio-temporal continuity. And, if such continuity is lacking, then we cannot legitimately claim that the recreated object is the same original object. For the same reason, it appears that the resurrected body cannot be identical to the original body. At most, the resurrected body would be a replica.

However, our intuitions are not absolutely clear. Consider, for example, the following case: a bicycle is exhibited in a store, and a customer buys it. In order to take it home, the customer dismantles the bicycle, puts its pieces in a box, takes it home, and once there, reassembles the pieces. Is it the same bicycle? It certainly seems so, even if there is no spatio-temporal continuity.

Nevertheless, there is room to doubt that the resurrected body would be made up of the original body’s same atoms. We know that matter recycles itself, and that due to metabolism, the atoms that once constituted the human body of a person may later constitute the body of another person. How could God resurrect bodies that shared the same atoms? Consider the case of cannibalism, as ridiculed by Voltaire:

A soldier from Brittany goes into Canada; there, by a very common chance, he finds himself short of food, and is forced to eat an Iroquis whom he killed the day before. The Iroquis had fed on Jesuits for two or three months; a great part of his body had become Jesuit. Here, then, the body of a soldier is composed of Iroquis, of Jesuits, and of all that he had eaten before. How is each to take again precisely what belongs to him? And which part belongs to each? (Voltaire, 1997: 147)

However, perhaps, in the resurrection, God needn’t resurrect the body. If we accept the body criterion for personal identity, then, indeed, the resurrected body must be the same original body. But, if we accept the psychological criterion, perhaps God only needs to recreate a person psychologically continuous with the original person, regardless of whether or not that person has the same body. John Hick believes this is how God could indeed proceed (Hick, 1994).

Hick invites a thought experiment. Suppose a man disappears in London, and suddenly someone with his same looks and personality appears in New York. It seems reasonable to consider that the person that disappeared in London is the same person that appeared in New York. Now, suppose that a man dies in London, and suddenly appears in New York with the same looks and personality. Hick believes that, even if the cadaver is in London, we would be justified to claim that the person that appears in New York is the same person that died in London. Hick’s implication is that body continuity is not needed for personal identity; only psychologically continuity is necessary.

And, Hick considers that, in the same manner, if a person dies, and someone in the resurrection world appears with the same character traits, memories, and so forth, then we should conclude that such a person in the resurrected world is identical to the person who previously died. Hick admits the resurrected body would be a replica, but as long as the resurrected is psychologically continuous with the original person, then it is identical to the original person.

Yet, in as much as Hick’s model depends upon a psychological criterion for personal identity, it runs into the same problems that we have reviewed when considering the psychological criterion. It seems doubtful that a replica would be identical to the original person, because more than one replica could be recreated. And, if there is more than one replica, then they would all claim to be the original person, but obviously, they cannot all be the original person. Hick postulates that we can trust that God would only recreate exactly one replica, but it is not clear how that would solve the problem. For, the mere possibility that God could make more than one replica is enough to conclude that a replica would not be the original person.

Peter Van Inwagen has offered a somewhat extravagant solution to these problems: “Perhaps at the moment of each man’s death, God removes his corpse and replaces it with a simulacrum which is what is burned or rots. Or perhaps God is not quite so wholesale as this: perhaps He removes for ‘safekeeping’ only the ‘core person’ – the brain and central nervous system – or even some special part of it” (Van Inwagen, 1997: 246). This would seem to solve the problem of spatio-temporal continuity. The body would never cease to exist, it would only be stored somewhere else until the moment of resurrection, and therefore, it would conserve spatio-temporal continuity. However, such an alternative seems to presuppose a deceitful God (He would make us believe the corpse that rots is the original one, when in fact, it is not), and would thus contradict the divine attribute of benevolence (a good God would not lie), a major tenet of monotheistic religions that defend the doctrine of resurrection.

Some Christian philosophers are aware of all these difficulties, and have sought a more radical solution: there is no criterion for personal identity over time. Such a view is not far from the bundle theory, in the sense that it is difficult to precise how a person remains the same over time. This position is known as ‘anti-criterialism’, that is, there is no intelligible criterion for personal identity; Trenton Merricks (1998) is its foremost proponent. By doing away with criteria for personal identity, anti-criterialists purport to show that objections to resurrection based on difficulties of personal identity have little weight, precisely because we should not be concerned about criteria for personal identity.

8. Parapsychology

The discipline of parapsychology purports to prove that there is scientific evidence for the afterlife; or at least, that there is scientific evidence for the existence of paranormal abilities that would imply that the mind is not a material substance. Originally founded by J.B.S. Rhine in the 1950s, parapsychology has fallen out of favor among contemporary neuroscientists, although some universities still support parapsychology departments.

a. Reincarnation

Parapsychologists usually claim there is a good deal of evidence in favor of the doctrine of reincarnation. Two pieces of alleged evidence are especially meaningful: (1) past-life regressions; (2) cases of children who apparently remember past lives.

Under hypnosis, some patients frequently have regressions and remember events from their childhood. But, some patients have gone even further and, allegedly, have vivid memories of past lives. A few parapsychologists take these as so-called ‘past-life regressions’ as evidence for reincarnation (Sclotterbeck, 2003).

However, past-life regressions may be cases of cryptomnesia, that is, hidden memories. A person may have a memory, and yet not recognize it as such. A well-known case is illustrative: an American woman in the 1950s was hypnotized, and claimed to be Bridey Murphy, an Irishwoman of the 19^th century. Under hypnosis, the woman offered a fairly good description of 19^th century Ireland, although she had never been in Ireland. However, it was later discovered that, as a child, she had an Irish neighbor. Most likely, she had hidden memories of that neighbor, and under hypnosis, assumed the personality of a 20^th century Irish woman.

It must also be kept in mind that hypnosis is a state of high suggestibility. The person that conducts the hypnosis may easily induce false memories on the person hypnotized; hence, alleged memories that come up in hypnosis are not trustworthy at all.

Some children have claimed to remember past lives. Parapsychologist Ian Stevenson collected more than a thousand of such cases (Stevenson, 2001). And, in a good portion of those cases, children know things about the deceased person that, allegedly, they could not have known otherwise.

However, Stevenson’s work has been severely critiqued for its methodological flaws. In most cases, the child’s family had already made contact with the deceased’s family before Stevenson’s arrival; thus, the child could pick up information and give the impression that he knows more than what he could have known. Paul Edwards has also accused Stevenson of asking leading questions towards his own preconceptions (Edwards, 1997: 14).

Moreover, reincarnation runs into conceptual problems of its own. If you do not remember past lives, then it seems that you cannot legitimately claim that you are the same person whose life you do not remember. However, a few philosophers claim this is not a good objection at all, as you do not remember being a very young child, and yet can still surely claim to be the same person as that child (Ducasse, 1997: 199).

Population growth also seems to be a problem for reincarnation: according to defenders of reincarnation, souls migrate from one body to another. This, in a sense, presupposes that the number of souls remains stable, as no new souls are created, they only migrate from body to body. Yet, the number of bodies has consistently increased ever since the dawn of mankind. Where, one may ask, were all souls before new bodies came to exist? (Edwards, 1997: 14). Actually, this objection is not so formidable: perhaps souls exist in a disembodied form as they wait for new bodies to come up (D’Souza, 2009: 57).

b. Mediums and Ghostly Apparitions

During the heyday of Spiritualism (the religious movement that sought to make contact with the dead), some mediums gained prominence for their reputed abilities to contact the dead. These mediums were of two kinds: physical mediums invoked spirits that, allegedly, produced physical phenomena (for example, lifting tables); and mental mediums whose bodies, allegedly, were temporarily possessed by the spirits.

Most physical mediums were exposed as frauds by trained magicians. Mental mediums, however, presented more of a challenge for skeptics. During their alleged possession by a deceased person’s spirit, mediums would provide information about the deceased person that, apparently, could not have possibly known. William James was impressed by one such medium, Leonora Piper, and although he remained somewhat skeptical, he finally endorsed the view that Piper in fact made contact with the dead.

Some parapsychologists credit the legitimacy of mental mediumship (Almeder, 1992). However, most scholars believe that mental mediums work through the technique of ‘cold reading’: they ask friends and relatives of a deceased person questions at a fast pace, and infer from their body language and other indicators, information about the deceased person (Gardner, 2003).

Parapsychologists have also gathered testimonies of alleged ghost appearances, especially cases where the spirit communicates something that no person could have known (for example, the location of a hidden treasure), and yet it is corroborated. This evidence seems far too anecdotal to be taken seriously; it does not go through the rigorous control that such a claim would require.

c. Electronic-Voice Phenomena

Some parapsychologists have tried to record white noise generated by vacant radio stations, and in places where it is known that no person is present (Raudive, 1991). Allegedly, some of those recordings have produced noises similar to human voices with strange messages, and these voices are believed to come from ghosts. Skeptics claim that such messages are too vague to be taken seriously, and that the tendency of the human mind to find purpose everywhere, promotes the interpretation of simple noises as human voices.

d. Near-Death Experiences

Ever since ancient times (for example, Plato’s myth of Er in The Republic), there have been reports of people who have lost some vital signs, and yet, regained them after a brief period of time. Some people have claimed to have unique experiences in those moments: an acute noise, a peaceful and relaxed sensation; the feeling of abandoning the body, floating in the air and watching the body from above; a passage thorough a dark tunnel; a bright light at the end of the tunnel; an encounter with friends, relatives, and religious characters; a review of life’s most important moments. These are described as near death experiences (Moody, 2001).

Some parapsychologists claim near death experiences are evidence of life after death, and some sort of window revealing the nature of the afterlife. Skeptical scientists, however, have offered plausible physiological explanations for such experiences. Carl Sagan considered the possibility that near death experiences evoke memories from the moment of birth: the transit through the tunnel would evoke the birth canal, and the sensation of floating in the air would evoke the sensation of floating in amniotic acid during gestation (Sagan, 1980).

There are still other physiological explanations. These experiences can be induced by stimulating certain regions of the brain. In moments of intense crises, the brain releases endorphins, and this may account for the peaceful and relaxed sensation. The experience of going through a tunnel may be due to anoxia (lack of oxygen), or the application of anesthetics containing quetamine. The review of life’s most important moments may be due to the stimulation of neurons in the temporal lobules. Encounters with religious characters may be hallucinations as a result of anoxia (Blackmore, 2002) Some patients that have undergone near death experiences have allegedly provided verifiable information that they had no way to know. Some parapsychologists take this as evidence that patients float through the air during near death experiences and, during the ordeal, they are capable to travel to other locations. This evidence is, however, anecdotal. And there is contrary evidence: Researchers have placed computer laptops with random images in the roof of emergency rooms, so that only someone watching from above could know the content of the images, but, so far, no patient has ever accurately described such images (Roach, 2005).

e. Extrasensory Perception

Parapsychologists have designed some experiments that purport to prove that some people have the ability of extrasensory perception or ESP (Radin, 1997). If this ability does indeed exist, it would not prove immortality, but it would seem to prove dualism; that is, the mind is not reducible to the brain.

The best formulated experiment is the so-called Ganzfeld experiment. Person A relaxes in a cabin, her eyes are covered with ping-pong ball halves, and listens to white noise for fifteen minutes. This is intended to promote sense deprivation. In another cabin, person B is shown a target image. Afterwards, subject A is shown the target image, along with three other images. We should expect a 25% chance probability that subject A will choose the target image, but when experiments are performed, 32% of the time, subject A is successful. Parapsychologists claim this is evidence that something strange is going on (as it defies the expectancy of chance), and their explanation is that some people have the ability of extra sensory perception.

However, this experiment is not without critics. There may be sensory leakage (perhaps the cabins are not sufficiently isolated from each other). The experiment’s protocols have not adequately presented the images in random sequences. And, even if, indeed, the results come out 32% accurate when only 25% is expected by chance, it should not be assumed that a paranormal phenomenon is going on; at most, further research would be required to satisfactorily reach a conclusion.

9. The Technological Prospect of Immortality

Most secular scientists have little patience for parapsychology or religiously-inspired immortality. However, the exponential growth of technological innovation in our era has allowed the possibility to consider that, in a not-too-distant future, bodily immortality may become a reality. A few of these proposed technologies raise philosophical issues.

a. Cryonics

Cryonics is the preservation of corpses in low temperatures. Although it is not a technology that purports to bring persons back to life, it does purport to conserve them until some future technology might be capable of resuscitating dead bodies. If, indeed, such technology were ever developed, we would need to revise the physiological criterion for death. For, if brain death is a physiological point of no return, then bodies that are currently cryogenically preserved and will be brought back to life, were not truly dead after all.

b. Strategies for Engineered Negligible Senescence

Most scientists are skeptical of the prospect of resuscitating already dead people, but some are more enthusiastic about the prospect of indefinitely procrastinating death by stopping the aging processes. Scientist Aubrey De Grey has proposed some strategies for engineered negligible senescence: their goal is to identify the mechanisms accountable for aging, and attempt to stop, or even, reverse them (by, say cell repair) (De Grey and Rae, 2008). Some of these strategies involve genetic manipulation and nanotechnology, and hence they bring forth ethical issues. These strategies also bring concern about the ethics of immortality, that is, is immortality even desirable? (See section 3 of this article).

c. Mind Uploading

Yet other futurists consider that, even if it were not possible to indefinitely suspend the body’s death, it would at least be possible to emulate the brain with artificial intelligence (Kurzweil, 1993; Moravec, 2003). Thus, some scientists have considered the prospect of ‘mind-uploading’, that is, the transfer of the mind’s information to a machine. Hence, even if the organic brain dies, the mind could continue to exist once it is uploaded in a silicon-based machine.

Two crucial philosophical issues are raised by this prospect. First, the field of philosophy of artificial intelligence raises the question: could a machine ever really be conscious? Philosophers who adhere to a functionalist understanding of the mind would agree; but other philosophers would not (Consider Searle’s Chinese Room Argument in Searle, 1998).

Even if we were to claim that a machine could in fact be conscious, the technological prospect of mind uploading raises a second philosophical issue: would an emulation of the brain preserve personal identity? If we adhere to a soul or body criterion of personal identity, we should answer negatively. If we adhere to a psychological criterion of personal identity, then we should answer affirmatively, for the artificial brain would indeed be psychologically continuous with the original person.

10. References and Further Reading

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Barnes, Jonathan. The Presocratic Philosophers: Thales to Zeno. Routledge. 1979.
Beloff, John. Parapsychology: A Concise History. Palgrave. 1997.
Bernstein, Morey. The Search for Bridey Murphy. Doubleday. 1956.
Blackmore, Susan. “Near-Death Experiencies”. in Shermer, Michael (Ed.). Skeptic Encyclopedia of Pseudoscience. ABC Clio. 2002, p. 150-155.
Blackmore, Susan. Consciousness: A Very Short Introduction. Oxford University Press. 2005.
Blum, Deborah. Ghost Hunters: William James and the Search for Scientific Proof of Life After Death. Penguin. 2007.
Broad, C.D. “On Survival Without a Body” in Edwards, Paul (Ed.) Immortality. Prometheus. 1997, pp. 276-278.
Carter, Matt. Minds and Computers: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Artificial Intelligence. Edinburgh University Press. 2007.
Chalmers, David. The Conscious Mind: In Search of a Fundamental Theory. Oxford University Press. 1996.
Chisholm, Roderick. Person and Object. Routledge. 2002.
Churchland, Paul. Neurophilosophy at Work. Cambridge University Press. 2007.
Craig. William. Reasonable Faith: Christian Truth and Apologetics. Crossway Books. 2008.
Cranston, S.L. and Williams, Carey. Reincarnation: A New Horizon in Science, Religion and Society. Julian Press, 1984.
Damasio, Antonio. Descartes’ Error: Emotion, Reason and The Human Brain. Vintage Books. 2006.
Damer, T. Edward. Attacking Faulty Reasoning. Cengage Learning. 2008.
De Grey, Aubrey and Rae, Michael. Ending Aging: The Rejuvenation Breakthroughs That Could Reverse Human Aging in Our Lifetime. St. Martin’s Griffin. 2008
Dehaene, Stanislas. The Cognitive Neuroscience of Consciousness. MIT Press. 2002.
Dennett, Daniel. Conciousness Explained. Back Bay Books. 1992.
Descartes, René. Discourse on Method and Meditations on First Philosophy, Donald A. Cress trans. Hackett Publishing Co 1980.
D’Souza, Dinseh. Life After Death. Regnery Publishing. 2009
Ducasse, C.J. “Survival as Transmigration” in Edwards, Paul (Ed.). Immortality. Prometheus. 1997, pp. 194-199.
Edwards, Paul. “Introduction” in Edwards, Paul (Ed.) Immortality. Prometheus. 1997, pp.1-70
Feser, Edward. Philosophy of Mind. Oneworld. 2008.
Fischer, John Martin. Our Stories: Essays on Life, Death and Free Will. Oxford University Press. 2009.
Flew, Antony. Merely Mortal: Can You Survive Your Own Death? Prometheus. 2000.
Frohock, Fred. Lives of the Psychics: The Shared Worlds of Science and Mysticism. University of Chicago Press. 2000
Gardner, Martin. Are Universes Thicker Than Blackberries? W.W. Norton. 2003.
Garrett, Brian. “Personal Identity” in Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Taylor & Francis. 1998, pp. 320-330.
Gazzaniga, Michael. Human. Harper Perennial. 2008.
Geach, Peter. “Reincarnation” in Flew, Antony (Ed.). Readings in the Philosophical Problems of Parapsychology. Prometheus. 1987, pp. 320-330.
Graham, George. Philosophy of Mind: An Introduction. Wiley Blackwell. 1998.
Guiley, Rosemary. The Guinness Encyclopedia of Ghosts and Spirits. Guinness Publishing. 1994.
Habermas, Gary and Moreland, J.P. Beyond Death: Exploring the Evidence for Immortality. Wipf & Stock Publishers. 2004.
Habermas, Gary. In Defence of Miracles. Inter Varsity Press. 2002.
Harman, Gilbert. Thought. Princeton University Press. 1973.
Harpur, Tom. Life After Death. McClelland and Stewart. 1991.
Hasker, William. The Emergent Self. Cornell University Press. 2001.
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Hospers, John. “Is the Notion of Disembodied Existence Intelligible?” in Edwards, Paul (Ed.). Immortality. Prometheus. 1997, pp. 279-281.
Hume, David. A Treatise of Human Nature. Nabu Press. 2010.
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Nuvision Publications. 2008.
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Kant, Immanuel. Critique of Practical Reason. Forgotten Books. 1999.
Kurzweil, Raymond. Age of Spiritual Machines: When Computers Exceed Human Intelligence. Allen & Unwin. 1999.
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Whasker, William. “Afterlife”. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (2005 Edition). .
Wilkes, Kathleen V. Real People: Personal Identity without Thought Experiments. Clarendon Press. 1988.
Williams, Bernard. Problems of the Self: Philosophical Papers. 1956-1972. Cambridge University Press. 1976.
Wright, N.T. The Resurrection of the Son of God. Fortress Press. 2006.
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Author Information

Gabriel Andrade
Email: Gabrielernesto2000@yahoo.com
La Universidad del Zulia
Venezuela

Donald Davidson: Philosophy of Language

Table of Contents

1. Davidson’s Theory of Meaning

a. Constraints on a Theory of Meaning

i. Compositionality

ii. No Meaning Entities

b. Theories of Truth as Theories of Meaning

c. Meaning and Truth

d. Formal and Natural Languages

i. Indexicals

ii. Indirect Discourse

2. Davidson’s Theory of Interpretation

a. Radical Translation

b. Radical Interpretation

i. Principles of Charity: Coherence

ii. Principles of Charity: Correspondence

c. Language without Conventions

d. Indeterminacy of Interpretation

e. Meaning and Interpretation

3. References and Further Reading

a. Anthologies of Davidson’s Writings

b. Individual Articles by Davidson

c. Primary Works by other Authors

d. Secondary Sources

i. Anthologies

ii. Critical Discussions of Davidson’s Philosophy

Author Information

Immanuel Kant: Philosophy of Religion

Table of Contents

1. Kant and Religion

2. God in Some Pre-critical Writings

3. Each Critique as Pivotal

a. The First Critique

b. The Second Critique

c. The Third Critique

4. The Prolegomena and Kant’s Lectures

a. The Prolegomena

b. Kant’s Lectures

5. Other Important Works

6. His Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone

7. Some Tantalizing Suggestions from the Opus Postumum

8. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

Metaethics

Table of Contents

1. History of Metaethics

a. Metaethics before Moore

b. Metaethics in the Twentieth-Century

2. The Normative Relevance of Metaethics

3. Semantic Issues in Metaethics

a. Cognitivism versus Non-Cognitivism

b. Theories of Moral Truth

4. Ontological Issues in Metaethics

a. Moral Realisms

b. Moral Relativisms

5. Psychology and Metaethics

a. Motivation and Moral Reasons

b. Experimental Metaethics

c. Moral Emotions

6. Epistemological Issues in Metaethics

a. Thick and Thin Moral Concepts

b. Moral Justification and Explanation

7. Anthropological Considerations

a. Cross-Cultural Differences

b. Cross-Cultural Similarities

8. Political Implications of Metaethics

9. References and Further Reading

a. Textual Citations

b. Anthologies and Introductions

Author Information

Theory of Mind

Table of Contents

1. Theory-Theory

a. The Child-Scientist Theory

b. The Modularist Theory-Theory

c. First-Person Mindreading and Theory-Theory

2. Simulation-Theory

a. Simulation with and without Introspection