Franz Brentano (1838-1917)

Franz Brentano was a major philosopher of the second half of the 19^th century who had a strong impact on the development of early phenomenology and analytic philosophy of mind. Brentano’s influence on students such as Karl Stumpf and Edmund Husserl was extensive, but Sigmund Freud was also much inspired by Brentano’s teaching and personality. Along with Bernard Bolzano, Brentano is acknowledged today as the co-founder of the Austrian tradition of philosophy.

Two of his theses have been the focus of important debates in 20^th century philosophy: the thesis of the intentional nature of mental phenomena, and the thesis that all mental phenomena have a self-directed structure which makes them objects of inner perception. The first thesis has been taken up by proponents of the representational theory of mind, while the second thesis continues to inspire philosophers who advocate a self-representational theory of consciousness.

Brentano’s interests, however, were not limited to the philosophy of mind. His ambition was greater: to make the study of mental phenomena the basis for renewing philosophy altogether. This renewal would encompass all philosophical disciplines, but especially logic, ethics, and aesthetics. Moreover, Brentano was a committed metaphysician, much in contrast to Kant’s transcendental idealism and its further developments in German philosophy. Brentano advocated a scientific method to rival Kantianism that combined Aristotelian ideas with Cartesian rationalism and English empiricism. He was a firm believer in philosophical progress backed up by a theistic worldview.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
   1. Life
   2. Works
2. Philosophy of Mind
   1. Philosophy and Psychology
   2. Inner Perception
   3. Intentionality
   4. Descriptive Psychology
3. The Triad of Truth, Goodness and Beauty
   1. A Philosophical System
   2. Judgement and Truth
   3. Interest and the Good
   4. Presentation and Beauty
4. Epistemology and Metaphysics
   1. Kinds of Knowledge
   2. A World of Things
   3. Substance and Accidents
   4. Dualism, Immortality, God
5. History of Philosophy and Metaphilosophy
   1. How to do History of Philosophy
   2. Aristotle’s Worldview
   3. Positivism and the Renewal of Philosophy
   4. Philosophical Optimism
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Monographs Published by Brentano
   2. Other Philosophical Works Published by Brentano
   3. Selected Works Published Posthumously from Brentano’s Nachlass
   4. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Franz Brentano was born into a distinguished German family of Italian descent whose influence on Germany’s cultural and academic life was considerable. His uncle Clemens Brentano (1748-1842) and his aunt Bettina von Arnim (1785-1859) were major figures of German Romanticism, and his brother Lujo Brentano (1844-1931) became an eminent German economist and social reformer. The Brentano brothers considered their family as “zealously Catholic” (Franz Brentano) and “highly conservative” (Lujo Brentano). Brentano’s early association with the Catholic Church complicated his life and affected his academic career in Würzburg and Vienna.

a. Life

Brentano was born on January 16, 1838, in Marienberg on the Rhine. He was one of five children who reached adulthood. He studied philosophy and theology in Munich, Würzburg, Berlin, and Münster. Among his teachers were the philologist Ernst von Lasaulx (1805-1861), the Aristotle scholar Friedrich Trendelenburg (1802-1872), and the Catholic philosopher Franz Jacob Clemens (1815-1862). Under Clemens’s supervision, Brentano first began a dissertation on Francisco Suárez, but then took his doctorate at Tübingen in 1862 with a thesis on the concept of being in Aristotle. He then enrolled in theology and was ordained a priest in 1864. After his habilitation in philosophy in 1866 in Würzburg, Brentano began his teaching career there, first as a Privatdozent, and from 1872 as an Extraordinarius. Among his students in Würzburg were Anton Marty and Carl Stumpf. The fact that he left the University of Würzburg shortly thereafter was due to a falling out with the Catholic Church. In the fight between liberal and conservative groups, which took place both inside and outside the Catholic Church at the time, Brentano wrote in a letter to a Benedictine abbot that he felt himself “caught between a rock and a hard place” (quoted in Binder 2019, p. 79 A key role was played by a document he had written for the bishop of Mainz where he was critical of the dogma of the infallibility of the Pope proclaimed by the first Vatican Council in 1870.

Despite this rift, Brentano was able to continue his academic career. After he convinced the responsible authorities in Vienna that he was neither anti-clerical nor atheistic, he was appointed to a professorship of philosophy at the University of Vienna in 1874, supported among others by Hermann Lotze (1817-1881). As in Würzburg, Brentano quickly found popularity among the students in Vienna. These included Edmund Husserl, Alexius Meinong, Alois Höfler, Kasimir Twardowski, Thomas Masaryk, Christian Ehrenfels and Sigmund Freud. Privately, Brentano found connections to the society of the Viennese bourgeoisie. He met Ida von Lieben, daughter of a wealthy Jewish family, finally left the Catholic Church, and married her in Leipzig in 1880. This union was followed by a protracted legal dispute in which Brentano tried in vain to regain his professorship, which he had to give up as a married former priest in Austria. In 1894, after the unexpected death of his wife Ida, Brentano was left alone with their six-year-old son Johannes (also called “Giovanni” or “Gio”). One year later, he decided to end his teaching career, now as a Privatdozent, and left Austria first for Switzerland, then for Italy.

Although Brentano was offered several professorships in both countries, the 57-year-old decided to live as a private scholar from then on. In 1896, he acquired Italian citizenship and lived in Florence and Palermo. He continued to spend summers in Austria at his vacation home in Schönbühel on the Danube. In 1897 Brentano married his second wife, the Austrian Emilie Rüprecht. She not only took care of the household and his son, but also increasingly supported Brentano in his scientific work, since his vision had started to decrease around 1903. Due to the outbreak of World War I and the entry of Italy into the war, Brentano moved with his family to Zurich in 1915. During his time as a private scholar, he not only kept in touch with a small circle of students who had meanwhile made careers in Germany and Austria, but he was also in lively exchange with philosophers and intellectuals in Europe. Inspired by these contacts, Brentano was highly active intellectually until his death on March 17, 1917.

b. Works

Brentano’s philosophical work consists of his published writings and an extensive Nachlass, which includes a large amount of lecture notes, manuscripts, and dictates from his later years. The bequest also contains a wealth of correspondence that Brentano exchanged with his former students (notably Anton Marty) and students of his students (notably Oskar Kraus). Other correspondents of Brentano were eminent scientists and philosophers such as Ludwig Boltzmann, Gustav Theodor Fechner, Ernst Mach, John Stuart Mill and Herbert Spencer.

As Brentano was a prolific writer, but reluctant to prepare his works for publication, it was mostly left to his students and later generations of editors to prepare publications from his Nachlass manuscripts. In doing so, the editors often took the liberty of adapting and modifying Brentano’s original text, often without marking the changes as such. As a result, only the works published by Brentano himself are a truly reliable source, while the volumes edited after Brentano’s death vary widely in editorial quality (see the warnings in References and Further Readings, section 3).

2. Philosophy of Mind

Brentano believed that psychology should follow the example of physiology and become a full-fledged science, while continuing to paly a special role within philosophy. To meet this goal, he conceived of psychology as a standalone discipline with its own subject matter, namely mental phenomena. The basic principles that inform us about these phenomena are emblematic of his conception of the mind and will be discussed in more detail below: his thesis of the intentional nature of mental phenomena; his thesis of inner perception as a secondary consciousness; and his classification of mental acts into presentations, judgements, and phenomena of love and hate.

In later years, Brentano drew an important distinction between descriptive and explanatory (“genetic”) psychology. These sub-disciplines of psychology differ both in their task and the methods they need to accomplish that task. According to Brentano, an analytical method is needed to describe psychological phenomena. We must analyze the experiences, which often only appear indistinct to us in inner perception, in order to precisely determine their characteristics. Genetic psychology, on the other hand, requires methods of explanation; it must be able to explain how the experiences that we perceive come about.

Brentano prepares the ground for that distinction in his seminal work Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, first published in 1874, and fleshes it out fully in the second edition of the Classification of Mental Phenomena in 1911. The second edition contains several new appendices, but it is still far from completing the book project as Brentano originally conceived it. According to this plan Brentano wanted to add four more books that give a full treatment of the three main classes of mental phenomena (presentations, judgements, acts of the will and emotional phenomena), as well as a treatment of the mind-body problem, which shows that some notion of immortality is compatible with our scientific knowledge of the mind (see section 4d).

While the Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint secured Brentano’s place in the history of philosophy of mind, it is not an isolated piece in Brentano’s oeuvre. It stands somewhat in the middle between his earlier work on The Psychology of Aristotle (1867) and his lectures on Descriptive Psychology (1884-1889). If we add to this Brentano’s lectures on psychology in Würzburg (1871-1873) and the works on sensory psychology in his later years (1892-1907), we see a continuous preoccupation with questions of psychology over more than 40 years.

a. Philosophy and Psychology

Brentano’s interest in the philosophy of mind was driven by the question of how psychology can claim for itself the status of a proper science. Taking his inspiration from Aristotle’s De Anima, Brentano holds that progress in psychology depends on progress in philosophy, but he takes this dependence to go both ways. This means that we can ascribe to Brentano two programmatic ideas:

• Philosophy helps psychology to clarify its empirical basis as well as to determine its object of research
• Conversely, psychology contributes in various ways to many areas of philosophy, especially epistemology, logic, ethics, aesthetics, and metaphysics

Implementing the first idea involved Brentano in addressing thorny questions of methodology and classification: What is the proper method for studying mental phenomena? How do mental phenomena differ from non-mental phenomena? Is consciousness a characteristic of the mental? How does consciousness of outer objects differ from what Brentano calls “inner consciousness”? How can we classify mental phenomena? The first two books of the Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint provide ample answers to these questions.

During his years in Vienna (1874-1895), Brentano’s interest shifted more and more towards his second programmatic idea. In this context, Brentano found it necessary to distinguish more sharply between a “descriptive” and a “genetic” psychology. With this distinction in hand, he tried to show what psychology might contribute to various parts of philosophy. While philosophy may be autonomous from genetic psychology, it builds on the resources of descriptive psychology. How this shift towards descriptive psychology gradually took hold of Brentano’s thinking can be seen from the titles of his Vienna lectures: “Psychology” (1874-1880), “Selected questions of psychology and aesthetics” (1883-86),  “Descriptive psychology” and “Psychognosy” (both published in 1887-1891).

It was only in later years that Brentano returned to questions of genetic psychology. Texts from the last decade of his life were published posthumously in a volume entitled On Sensory and Noetic Consciousness. Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint III (1928, English translation 1981). The subtitle is misleading because this volume is not a continuation of Brentano’s earlier book. How Brentano planned to continue his Psychology has been succinctly described in Rollinger (2012).

b. Inner Perception

In studying mental phenomena, philosophers often emphasize a crucial distinction between two questions:

1. 1. How can we obtain knowledge of our own mental acts?
   2. How can we obtain knowledge of mental acts in other subjects?

In dealing with these questions, Brentano rejects the idea that separating the two questions means to postulate an “inner” sense in addition to the outer senses. This old empiricist idea inherited from Locke was still popular among philosophers and psychologists of Brentano’s time. As an alternative to this old view, Brentano suggests that we access our own mental phenomena by simply having them, without the need of any extra activity such as introspection or reflection.

To appreciate the large step that Brentano takes here, one must address several much-contested questions about the nature of our self-knowledge (see Soldati 2017). To begin with, how does Brentano distinguish between “inner perception” and what he calls “inner observation”? One way to do so is to consider the role that attention and memory play in accessing our own mental states. Like John Stuart Mill, Brentano argues that attending to one’s current experiences involves the possibility of changing those very experiences. Brentano therefore suggests that inner perception involves no act of attention at all, while inner observation requires attending to past experiences as we remember them (see Brentano 1973, p. 35).

But Brentano goes further than that. According to him, we must not think of inner perception as a separate mental act that accompanies a current experience. Instead, we should think of an experience as a complex mental phenomenon that includes a self-directed perception as a necessary part. Some scholars have taken this view to imply that inner perception is an infallible source of knowledge for Brentano. But this conclusion needs to be drawn with care. Take, for instance, a sailor who mistakenly thinks he sees a piece of land on the horizon. Inner perception is telling him with self-evidence that he is having a visual experience of a piece of land. And yet he is mistaken about what he sees, if he mistakes a cloud, let’s say, for a piece of land. Still, Brentano would say that it was not inner perception that misled the sailor, but rather his interpretation of the visual content as of a piece of land. Such misinterpretations are errors of judgements, or attentional deficits that happen in observing or attending to the content of our experience. In the end, Brentano seems committed to the view that unlike observation, inner perception has no proper content and therefore has nothing it could be wrong about.

How can Brentano defend this commitment? One way to do so would be to appeal to the authority of Aristotle and his view that we are seeing objects, while at the same time experiencing seeing them. While Brentano is always happy to follow Aristotle, he also bolsters his view with new arguments. In the present case he does so by drawing on the ontology of parts and wholes. A common understanding of parts and wholes has it that a whole is constituted by detachable parts, like a heap of corn is constituted by single corns as detachable parts. But this model does not apply to inner perception, says Brentano. A conscious experience is not constituted like a heap of corn: you can’t detach the person who sees something from the subject who innerly perceives the seeing. This leads Brentano to the key insight that what appears to us in inner perception is nothing other than the entire mental act that presents itself to us.

How then does Brentano explain the immediate knowledge we have of our own mental phenomena? Having removed any appeal to a faculty of inner sense, Brentano ends up with a form of conceptual insight that could be summarized in the following way: “Immediate knowledge of our present mental states comes with the insight that we can only conceptually separate what we see, feel, or think from the act of seeing, feeling or thinking.” Such immediate knowledge becomes impossible when we consider the life of other people. In this case we are restricted to a form of “indirect knowledge” of their feelings and thoughts by listening to what they say or observing their behavior. This indirectness implies that we may only be certain that the other person feels or thinks something, without knowing what exactly it is that they feel or think. Here we are not just dealing with conceptual differences, but with a real difference between our own experiences and the mental phenomena we discover in the minds of others.

But are we able to “read” the minds of other people? In book II of his Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, Brentano argues that psychology could not acquire the status of a proper science merely on the basis of the data of inner perception. We need to make sure that our conception of the mind is not biased by our own experiences. The data that help us to guard against such an egocentric bias include (a) biological facts and the behavior of others indicating, for example, that they feel hunger or thirst like we do, (b) the mutual understanding of communicative acts such as gestures or linguistic behavior, as well as (c) the recognition of behavior as voluntary actions performed with certain intentions.

In drawing on these resources, Brentano shows no skepticism towards our social instincts. It is part of our daily practice to infer from the behavior of others whether someone is hungry, whether he is ashamed because he has done something wrong, and so on. For Brentano, there is no reason why a scientific psychology should dispense with such inferences. On the contrary, he acknowledges that a psychology that limits itself exclusively to the knowledge of its own mental phenomena is exposed to the danger of far-reaching self-deceptions. Psychology must face the task of tracking down such deceptions.

Brentano thus provides a thoroughly optimistic picture of the empirical basis of psychology. With inner perception, it can count on the immediate and potentially error-free access that we have to our own experiences, while the fallacies that arise in self-observation can be rectified by relying on a rich repertoire of inferences about other people’s mental states.

c. Intentionality

Psychology is a self-standing science, says Brentano, because it has a specific subject matter, namely mental phenomena. In his Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint (1874), Brentano argues that these phenomena form a single and unified class thanks to a general characteristic that distinguishes them from all other phenomena: their intentional directedness to objects.

This so-called “intentionality thesis” has sparked a wide-ranging debate among Brentano’s pupils. Husserl and Twardowski–just to mention two–came up with different readings of what Brentano describes as the “intentional directedness towards an object.” Their disagreement paved the way for an interpretation (due to Oskar Kraus and later taken up by Roderick Chisholm) that ascribes to Brentano a fundamental change of view about the nature of intentionality. According to this interpretation, we find in the early Brentano a rich ontology of intentional objects that is threatened by inconsistency. Therefore, Brentano later developed a radical critique of non-real objects that forced him to accept a non-relational theory of intentionality. In the meantime, this interpretation has been disputed for various reasons: Some scholars (for example, Barry Smith, Arkadiusz Chrudzimski) tried to resolve the alleged inconsistencies in Brentano’s early ontology, thus removing the need for a radical shift to a non-relational theory of intentionality, while other scholars (e.g. Mauro Antonelli and Werner Sauer) tried to show that Brentano’s later view is not very different from his earlier conception. Still others have discussed whether one finds at the core of Brentano’s theory a relational concept of intentionality that applies to some but not all mental phenomena, thus putting pressure on the thesis that all mental phenomena share the same feature of intentionality (see Brandl, 2023).

These different descriptions of intentionality played an important role in the reception of the concept by Brentano’s students. Following Twardowski, Husserl insisted on the distinction between the content and the object of an intentional act, stressing (against Twardowski) that some acts are intentional and are yet objectless, e.g. my presentation of a golden mountain. Following this line, Husserl developed a non-relational, semantic view of intentionality in his Logical Investigations (1900/1901), according to which intentional acts are acts of “etwas meinen” (meaning something). Going beyond Brentano and Twardowski, Husserl argues that acts of meaning instantiate ideal species that account for the objectivity of meaning. Although Brentano seemed to be aware of the semantic problem of the objectivity of meaning in some of his lectures, this was clearly not a central concern for his understanding of intentionality. Meinong, on the other hand, extends Brentano’s concept of intentionality in the opposite direction to Husserl’s: not only is there no sharp distinction between semantics and ontology in Meinong, but all mental acts, including my presentation of a golden mountain, in his view have an object, which may or may not exist, or may simply belong to the extra-ontological realm (Außersein). In any case, Meinong defends a fully relational view of intentionality.

Given the plurality of developments of the concept within his school and the plurality of descriptions offered by Brentano himself, one lesson to be drawn from this debate is that the scholastic terminology used by Brentano is much less informative than it has been taken to be. Brentano seems to use different terms for object-directedness in the same way that one uses different numerical terms to measure the temperature of a body in Celsius or Fahrenheit. In putting mental phenomena on different scales, metaphorically speaking, he highlights some of their differences and commonalities and describes these as “having the same intentional content” or “being directed at the same object.” Take sense perception, for example. If every mental phenomenon has an object, then both my seeing and my imagining an elephant have an object. While this is true according to one use of the term “object,” it is not true if we want to compare an act of perception with an act of hallucination. Then, the so-called “object” of the sensory experience might be better described as a “content” of experience. It fills the grammatical gap in the expression “I see X,” which the hallucinator might also use.

Another controversy concerns phenomena that do not appear to be intentional at all. For instance, one can simply be in a sad mood without being sad about a particular event. Or one may generally tend to jealousy, without that jealousy being triggered by any particular object. Brentano’s intentionality thesis has been defended on the grounds that all mental states fulfill a representational function. The function of being sad could be, for example, to cast any goal we are striving for in a negative light. This could explain the paralyzing effect of sadness. But there is also the possibility of allowing that some mental phenomena may have objects only in a derived sense: for instance, when a subject perceives herself as being in a certain mood. The mood or character trait in itself might be “undirected,” but it would still be an object of inner consciousness when the subject perceives herself as being sad.

Brentano was not yet concerned with the many further questions raised by a representational theory of the mind. Thus, it is not clear how he would treat activities, processes, and operations that underlie our sensory experiences, feelings or acts of the will. Would they have intentional content for him only if they are part of our consciousness? Or would Brentano regard them as non-intentional “physical” phenomena to be studied by the physiological sciences? Perhaps the best way to relate Brentano to the contemporary debate about such questions is to say that he promotes a kind of qualitative psychology that does not need to invoke unconscious mental processes (see Citlak, 2023).

d. Descriptive Psychology

In the manuscripts starting from 1875, in which Brentano worked on the continuation of his Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, one finds the first explicit mention of a separation between descriptive and genetic psychology. The basic idea behind this distinction is that a science of psychology cannot get off the ground unless it is able to identify the components of consciousness and their interrelationships. This requires something like a “geography” of mental concepts, which descriptive psychology is supposed to provide.

Although Brentano approaches this issue in the spirit of the empiricism of Locke and Hume, his objectives are somewhat closer to Descartes’, that is, to find the source of conceptual truths that are self-evident. Combining empiricism about concepts with the search for self-evident conceptual truths is the key to understanding the aim of descriptive psychology, which can be summarized as follows: Descriptive psychology aims to determine the elements of consciousness on the basis of inner perception, and thus to show how we arrive at concepts and judgements that we accept as self-evident and absolutely true. How Brentano tries to implement this plan can be seen in some examples that he discusses in his lecture courses. In one example, he asks whether it is possible to make contradictory judgements. Brentano denies that this is possible as soon as we have a clear perception of the fact that the judgements “A exists” and “A does not exist” cannot both be true. In another example, he asks whether one can feel a sensation without attributing content to that experience. Again, Brentano argues that this is impossible, and that we know this once we have a clear grasp of what “feeling a sensation” means. And we get a clear grasp of what “feeling a sensation” means by describing or analyzing the experience of feeling a sensation into its more basic constituents, by providing examples of such cases, by contrasting different cases, and so on.  Doubts about the validity of these results are possible, but they can be treated as temporary. They can only arise while our knowledge of the elements of consciousness and their connections is incomplete.

In summary, we can say that Brentano conceived of descriptive psychology as an epistemological tool. It is aimed at principles which, like the axioms of mathematics, are immediately self-evident or can be traced back–in principle–to immediately self-evident truths. The caveat “in principle” reminds us that we may have good reason to believe that these self-evident truths exist even if we do not yet know what they are.

3. The Triad of Truth, Goodness and Beauty

In the second half of the 19^th century the question of the objective character of logic, ethics and aesthetics became a much-contested issue in philosophy. Brentano’s answer to this question is guided by a grand idea: In these disciplines, the theoretical principles of psychology find their application. The domain of application is fixed in each case by one of the three fundamental classes of mental phenomena: logic is the art of making correct judgements, notably judgements inferred from other judgements; ethics deals with attitudes of interest, such as emotional and volitional acts, which direct us to what is good; while aesthetics examines presentations and our pleasure in having them, which makes us acquainted with what is beautiful.

Brentano thus places psychology at the base of what appears to be a philosophical system. The idea of such a system, however, was severely criticized by Husserl, who accused Brentano of psychologism. From the point of view of logic, this accusation weighs heavily since Brentano transforms the laws of logic into laws of correct thinking. But the objection here is a general one. It can also be used to deny that ethics should be based on moral psychology, and that aesthetics should be based on the psychology of imagination. If Brentano has a good answer to Husserl, it must be a general one.

a. A Philosophical System

Brentano was never convinced by Husserl’s claim that phenomenology can only play a foundational role within philosophy if it is freed from its psychological roots. His answer to Husserl’s reproach was a counter-reproach: Whoever speaks of “psychologism” really means subjectivism, which says that knowledge claims may only be valid for a single subject. For instance, an argument may be valid for me, even if others do not share my view. Pointing to his notion of self-evidence, which is not a subjective feeling at all, Brentano sees his position as shielded from this danger. He regards Husserl’s accusation as based on confusion or deliberate misunderstanding.

The jury is still out on this. While most phenomenologists tend to agree with Husserl, others see nothing wrong with the kind of psychologism that Brentano advocates. Some go even further and insist that only by reviving Brentano’s project of grounding mental concepts in experience can we hope to avoid the dead ends in the study of consciousness to which materialism and functionalism lead (see Tim Crane, 2021).

An interpretation of Brentano that also tries to make progress on the issue of psychologism has been proposed by Uriah Kriegel:

In order to understand the true, the good and the beautiful, we must get a clear idea of (i) the distinctive mental acts that aim at them, and (ii) the success of this aim. According to Brentano, the true is that which is right or fitting or appropriate to believe; the good is that which is right/appropriate to love or like or approve of; and the beautiful is that which is right/appropriate to be pleased with (U. Kriegel: The Routledge Handbook of Franz Brentano and the Brentano School. p. 21).

Kriegel’s interpretation is inspired by a tradition, going back to Moses Mendelssohn, of conceiving of truth, goodness, and beauty as closely related concepts. Brentano gives this idea a psychological twist:

It is necessary, then, to interpret this triad of the Beautiful, the True, and the Good, in a somewhat different fashion. In so doing, it will emerge that they are related to three aspects of our mental life: not, however, to knowledge, feeling and will, but to the triad that we have distinguished in the three basic classes of mental phenomena (Brentano 1995, 261).

Brentano scholars must decide how much weight to give to the idea expressed in this quotation. While Kriegel believes that the idea deserves full development, others are more sceptical. They point out that such a system-oriented interpretation goes against the spirit of Brentano’s philosophising. Wolfgang Huemer takes this line when he suggests that “Brentano’s hostility to German system philosophy and his empiricist and positivist approach made him immune to the temptation to construct a system of his own” (Huemer 2021, p.11).

Another question that arises at this point is how to integrate metaphysics into the system proposed by Kriegel. Brentano hints at a possible answer to this question by adding to the triad “the ideal of ideals,” which consists of “the unity of all truth, goodness and beauty” (Brentano 1995, 262). Ideals are achieved by the correct use of some mental faculties. Whether this also holds for the “ideal of ideals” is unclear. Perhaps Brentano is referring here to a form of wisdom that emerges from our ability to perceive, analyse and describe the facts of our mental life (see Susan Gabriel, 2013).

b. Judgement and Truth

Brentano adopts a psychological approach to logic which stands opposed to the anti-psychologistic consensus in modern logic that takes propositions, sentences, or assertions as the primary bearers of truth.  Brentano’s approach starts from the observation that simple judgements can easily be divided into positive and negative ones. For Brentano, a simple judgement is correct if it makes the right choice between two responses. We can either acknowledge a presented object when we judge that it exists, or reject it when we judge that it does not exist. To illustrate this, suppose you have an auditory experience where you are presented suddenly with a gunshot. The sound wakes you up and you have no clue as to whether what you heard was real or just a dream. You are presented with content (the gunshot heard), and now you take a stance on this content, either by accepting it (“yes, it’s a gunshot”) or rejecting it (“no, it’s not a gunshot”).  The stance you take will be right or wrong, and the resulting judgement will be true or false.

Now, there are two different ideas here that need to be carefully distinguished. One is the following concept acquisition principle:

We acquire the concept of truth by abstracting it from experiences of correct judgement.

The other is a definition of truth:

A judgement is true if and only if it is correct to acknowledge its object or if it is correct to reject its object.

The idea of defining truth in this way raises the question of how it relates to the classical correspondence theory of truth. The critical issue here is the concept of “object,” and the ontological commitments connected with this term. The common view is that Brentano rejected the view that facts or states of affairs could be objects standing in a correspondence relation to a judgement. In a lecture given in 1889, entitled “On the Concept of Truth,” Brentano rehearses some of the criticisms that the correspondence theory has received. He draws particular attention to the problem of negative existential judgements such as “there are no dragons.” This judgement seems to be true precisely because nothing in reality corresponds to the term “dragon.” For Brentano, this speaks not only against the introduction of negative facts, such as the fact that there are no dragons, but also against the acceptance in one’s ontology of states of affairs that might obtain if there were dragons, for example  the state of affairs that dragons can sing.

But abandoning the correspondence theory has its price. How can Brentano distinguish between truth on the one hand, and the more demanding notion of correctness on the other? Correct judgements should help us to attain knowledge. If we want to know whether the noise that we heard was a gunshot, we are not engaged in a game of guessing, but rather we are trying to be as reasonable as possible about the probability that it was in fact a real gunshot. What is it that makes our judgement correct, if it is not the correspondence with a real object or fact?

Brentano tries to capture this more demanding notion of correctness with his notion of “self-evidence.” He points out that the judgement of a subject can be true even if it is not self-evident to that subject. This leaves open the possibility that it is evident to another subject whose judgement would then be correct. Suppose your judgement is that John is happy. You may have good reasons for judging so, but the truth of this judgement is not self-evident to you. There is however a person, John, who might be able to judge with self-evidence that he is happy right now.  To say that your judgement is true means that it agrees with the judgement of John when asked whether he is happy or not.

But what about judgements like “Jack has won the lottery”? In this case we can ask the company running the lottery whether this assertion is true, but we will find no one in a position to resolve this question in a self-evident judgement. How then can Brentano’s definition be considered a general definition of truth that applies to all judgements?

It is at this point that the distinction between a definition of truth and a principle of concept acquisition becomes crucial. When we ask how we acquire the concept of truth, the slogan “Correctness First!” tells us that we acquire the concept of truth only later: the first step is to recognize that judging with self-evidence means to judge correctly (see Textor 2019). But we must not conclude from this that the slogan also applies when we define the concept of truth. Towards the end of his lecture “On the Concept of Truth” Brentano notices that one can remove the notion of “correspondence” from the classical Aristotelian definition of truth, without making it incomprehensible or false. “A judgement of the form ‘A exists’ is true if and only if A exists; a judgement of the form ‘A does not exist’ is true if A does not exist.” Was Brentano then a pioneer of a minimalist theory of truth? It has been argued that this is at least an interesting alternative to the epistemological interpretation described above (see Brandl, 2017). It explains why Brentano in his lecture on the concept of truth finds it unproblematic that a definition of truth may seem trivial. In doing so, he allows that a definition need not be informative about how we acquire the concept of truth.

c. Interest and the Good

The distinction between defining a concept and explaining how we acquire that concept also plays a role in Brentano’s meta-ethical theory of correctness. A few months before his lecture on the concept of truth, the Viennese Law Society had asked Brentano to present his views on whether there was such a thing as a natural sense of justice. In his lecture “On the Origin of our Knowledge of Right and Wrong” (1889), Brentano gives a positive answer to the question posed by the Society, but he makes it clear that the term “natural sense” can be understood in different ways. For him, it is not an innate ability to see what is just or unjust. Rather, what Brentano is defending is the idea that there are “rules which can be known to be right and binding, in and for themselves, and by virtue of their own nature” (Brentano, 1889, p.3).

Brentano’s meta-ethical theory of right and wrong can therefore be seen as a close cousin of his theory of truth. It is a highly original theory because it steers a middle course between the empirical sentimentalism of Hume and the a priori rationalism of Kant. Brentano carves out a third option by asking: What are the phenomena of interest (as Brentano calls them) that form the basis of our moral attitudes and decisions? Introducing the notion of “correct love,” he proposes the following principle of concept acquisition: We acquire the concept of the good by abstracting it from instances of correct love. The term “love” here stands for a positive interest, in polar opposition to “hate,” which includes for Brentano any negative dis-interest. For Brentano, these are phenomena in the same category as simple feelings of benevolence, but with a more complex structure that makes them cognitively much more powerful. By introducing these more powerful notions, Brentano hopes to show how one can take a psychological approach in meta-ethics that still “radically and completely [breaks] with ethical subjectivism” (ibid., p. xi, transl. modified).

We have already mentioned that Brentano denies that our moral attitudes and decisions are based on an innate, and in this sense “natural,” instinct. It may be true that we instinctively love children and cute pets, and that these creatures fully deserve our caring response. But such instinctive or habitual responses can also be misleading. We may instinctively or habitually love things that do not deserve our love, for example if we have become addicted to them. A theory that breaks with ethical subjectivism must be able to tell us why our love for children and pets is right and our love for a drug is wrong.

One way to approach this matter is to interpret Brentano as a precursor of a “fitting attitude” theory (see Kriegel 2017, p. 224ff). When we love an object that deserves our love, we may call this a “fitting attitude.” But to know what “fittingness” means, we have to turn to inner perception. Inner perception tells us, for example, when we love the kindness of a person, that this is a correct emotional response. Once we know that a person is kind, we know immediately that her kindness is something to be loved. This is “self-imposing,” as Kriegel says.

The question now is whether inner perception will also provide us with a list of preferences that is beyond doubt. For example, does inner perception tell us that being healthy or happy is better than being sick or sad, or as Brentano would put it: that it is correct to love health and happiness more than sickness or sadness? Such claims are open to counterexamples, or so it would seem. A person might want to get sick, or give in to sadness, or deliberately hurt herself. But there is a response Brentano can make to defend the self-imposing character of a preference-order. He could say that people have such deviant preferences only for the purpose of achieving some further goal. If we ask for good things that can be final goals, i.e. goals that we do not pursue for the sake of some other goal, then no one can reasonably doubt that health, happiness, and knowledge are better than sickness, sadness, and error.

Following this line, these cases could be treated in the same way as true judgements that are not self-evident to the subject making them: Even if it is not self-evident to a subject that health is a good, there may be subjects who take it as an ultimate goal and for whom it is a self-imposing good. Brentano can thus also claim to avoid a dilemma that threatens his meta-ethics: If goodness just depends on our emotional responses, this would make this notion fully subjective. But if it covers only those cases when the correctness of our love is self-evident to us, its domain of application would be very small indeed. Hence the idea that goodness must correlate with the responses of a perfect moral agent.

Brentano’s notion of correct love may explain how we acquire the concept of goodness, but it need not figure as part of a substantive definition of this concept. Cases of moral behavior whose correctness is self-imposing may still be informative, without comparing our moral behavior with an ideal moral agent. These cases suggest a preference order of goodness. For example, cases in which people sacrifice all their possessions to get medical treatment may help us to see why health is such a high good, perhaps even an ultimate good. And cases in which people risk their health for moral reasons may help us to see that there are goods that are ranked even higher than good health. Just as self-evident judgements lead us to the idea that truth is the highest epistemic value, so acts of love, whose correctness is self-imposing, can lead us to the idea of a supreme good.

d. Presentation and Beauty

Brentano concludes his analysis of normative concepts with an analysis of the concept of beauty. Extending his arguments against subjectivism, he attacks the common view that beauty exists only “in the eyes of the beholder.” For Brentano, beauty is a form of goodness that is no less objective than other forms of goodness. What the common view rightly points out is merely a fact about how we acquire the concept of beauty, namely by recourse to experience. Since this also holds for the concepts of truth and moral goodness, as Brentano says, beauty is no exception.

While we do not have a fully worked out version of Brentano’s aesthetic theory, its outlines are clear from lecture notes in his Nachlass (see Brentano: Grundzüge der Ästhetik, 1959). Again, taking a psychological approach, Brentano argues that it is not a simple form of pleasure that makes us see or feel the beauty of an object. Like in the case of moral judgements, it is a more complex mental state with a two-level structure. When we judge something to be beautiful, the first-level acts are acts of presentation: we perceive something or recall an image from memory. To this, we add a second-level phenomenon of interest: either “delight” or “disgust.” This gives us the following principle of concept acquisition: We acquire the concept of beauty by abstracting it from experiences of correct delight in a presentation.

Brentano’s theory nicely incorporates the fact that people differ in their aesthetic feelings. Musicians feel delight when hearing their favorite piece of music, art lovers when looking at a favorite painting, and nature lovers when enjoying a good view of the landscape. What they have in common is a particular kind of experience, which is why they can use the term “beautiful” in the same way. It is the experience of delight that underlies their understanding of beauty. Yet it is not a simple enjoyment like the pleasure we may feel when we indulge in ice cream or when we take a hot bath. Aesthetic delight is a response that requires a more reflective mode. To feel a higher-order pleasure, we must pay attention to the way objects appear to us and contemplate the peculiarities of these representations.

This reconstruction of Brentano’s aesthetic theory suggests that Brentano does not need a substantive definition of beauty. He can get by with general principles that connect the notions of beauty and delight, mimicking those that connect goodness with love, or truth with judgement and existence. As early as 1866, Brentano used this formulation of such a principle in its application to aesthetics: something is beautiful if its representation is the object of a correct emotion (see Brentano, “Habilitation Theses”). While these principles come with a sense of obviousness, interesting consequences follow from Brentano’s explanation of how we acquire our knowledge of them.

First, it follows that just as we can be mistaken in our judgements and emotional responses, so we can fail to appreciate the aesthetic qualities of an object. People may feel pleasure from things that do not warrant such pleasure, or they may fail to respond with pleasure to even the most beautiful things in front of their eyes. A plausible explanation for such cases of aesthetic incompetence is that people can perceive things very differently. They may not hear what the music lover hears, or fail to see what the nature lover sees, and therefore cannot understand why they find these things so pleasurable.

Second, Brentano’s theory implies that no relation of correspondence between mind and reality will explain what justifies aesthetic pleasure. Such justification can only come from inner perception, which provides us with exemplary cases of aesthetic delight. In such cases, like in the case of moral feelings, the correctness of the enjoyment is self-imposing. Such experiences may serve as a yardstick for judging cases whose beauty is less obvious and therefore more controversial.

4. Epistemology and Metaphysics

Brentano’s interest in questions of psychology is matched by an equally deep interest in questions of metaphysics. In both areas Brentano draws inspiration from Aristotle and the Aristotelian tradition. We can see this from his broad notion of metaphysics, encompassing ontological, cosmological, and theological questions. The central ontological question for Aristotle is the question of “being as such”; what does it mean to say that something is, is being, or has being? This is followed by questions concerning the categories of being, e.g.: What are the highest categories into which being can be divided? The second part of metaphysics, cosmology, seeks to establish the first principles of the cosmic order. It addresses questions concerning space, time and causality. Finally, the pinnacle of metaphysics is to be found in natural theology, which asks for the reason of all being: Does the world have a first cause, and does the order of the world suggest a wise and benevolent creator of the world?

For Brentano, as for Kant, these metaphysical questions pose an epistemological challenge first of all because they tend to exceed the limits of human understanding. To defend the possibility of metaphysical knowledge against skepticism, Brentano takes a preliminary step which he calls “Transcendental Philosophy,” but without adopting Kant’s Copernican turn. On the contrary, for Brentano, Kant himself counts as a skeptic because he declares things in themselves to be unknowable. What Kant overlooked, Brentano argues, is the self-evidence with which we make certain judgements. From this experience, he believes we can derive metaphysical principles whose validity is unquestionable.

a. Kinds of Knowledge

Skeptics of metaphysical knowledge often draw a contrast between metaphysical and scientific knowledge. Brentano resisted such an opposition, opting instead for an integration of scientific knowledge into metaphysics. He must therefore face the following conundrum: How can philosophy integrate the results obtained by the special sciences while at the same time making claims that go beyond the scope of any of the individual sciences?

Kant’s attempt to resolve this dilemma is based on the special nature of synthetic judgements a priori. Such judgements have empirical content, Kant holds, but we recognize them as true by the understanding alone, independently of sensory experience. Metaphysical knowledge thus becomes possible, but it is constrained by the scope of the synthetic judgements a priori. Brentano rejects this Kantian solution as inconclusive. Whatever a synthetic judgement a priori may be, it lacks what Brentano calls “self-evidence.” Metaphysics must not be constrained by such “blind prejudices,” Brentano holds.

Rejecting Kant’s view, Brentano proposes his own classification of judgements based on two distinctions: He divides judgements into those that are made with and without self-evidence, and he distinguishes between judgements that are purely assertive in character and apodictic (necessarily true or necessarily false) judgements. Knowledge in the narrow sense can only be found in judgements that are self-evident or that can be deduced from self-evident judgements. This does not mean, however, that non-evident judgements have no epistemic value for Brentano. To see this, we can replace the assertive/apodictic distinction with a distinction between purely empirical and not purely empirical judgements. Crossing this distinction with the evident/not-evident distinction gives us four possible kinds of knowledge:

• knowledge through self-evident purely empirical judgements
• knowledge through non-self-evident purely empirical judgements
• knowledge through self-evident not purely empirical judgements, and
• knowledge through non-self-evident not purely empirical judgements.

To the first category belong judgements of inner perception in which we acknowledge the existence of a current mental phenomenon. Such judgements are always made with self-evidence, according to Brentano. For instance, you immediately recognize the truth of “I am presently thinking about Socrates” when you do have such thoughts and therefore cannot reasonably doubt their existence.

Category 2 contains the non-self-evident empirical judgements, including all empirical hypotheses. These judgements differ in the degree of their confirmation, which is expressed in probability judgements. Although they lack self-evidence, Brentano allows that they may have what he calls “physical certainty.” Repeated observation may lead us to the certainty, for instance, that the sun will rise tomorrow. It is a judgement with a very high probability.

Category 3 contains apodictic universal judgements which, according to Brentano, are always negative in character. For instance, the true form of the law of excluded middle is not expressed by “for all x, either x is F or x is not-F,” but rather by the existential negative form: “there is no x which is F and not-F.” The truth of such a judgement is self-evident in a negative sense, i.e. it expresses the impossibility of acknowledging the conjunction of a property and its negation.

Finally, what about judgements in category 4? These judgements are similar to those which Kant classified as synthetic a priori. While Brentano denies that mathematical propositions fall into this category, taking them to be analytic and self-evident, he recognises a special status for judgements such as “Something red cannot possibly be blue” —that is, blue and red in the same place (see Brentano: Versuch über die Erkenntnis, p. 47). Or consider the judgement “It is impossible for parallels to cross”. These judgements are based on experiences described in the framework of commonsense psychology or Euclidean geometry. We can imagine alternative frameworks in which these judgements turn out to be false. But for practical reasons we can ignore this possibility and classify them as axioms and hence as knowledge.

Brentano’s official doctrine is that there are no degrees of evidence and that all axioms are self-evident judgements in category 3, despite the fact that many of them have been disputed. This puts a lot of pressure on explaining away these doubts as unjustified. Brentano was confident that this was a promising project and that it was the only way to show how metaphysics could aim at a form of wisdom that goes beyond the individual sciences. A more modest approach would emphasize the fact that axioms are not purely empirical judgements: they are part of conceptual frameworks like commonsense psychology or Euclidean geometry. These frameworks operate with relations (for example, of opposition or correlation) that may seem self-evident, but alternative frameworks in which other relations hold are conceivable. Treating axioms as knowledge in category 4 leads to a more modest epistemology, which might still serve metaphysics in the way Brentano conceived its role.

b. A World of Things

There are many possible answers to the question “What is the world made of?” The first task of ontology is therefore to compare the different possible answers and to provide criteria for choosing one ontology over another. After considering various options, Brentano settled on the view that the world is made of real things and nothing else. To emphasize that Brentano defends a particular version of realism, his view is called “Reism.”

To better understand Brentano’s Reism, it is necessary to follow his psychological approach. Crucial to Brentano’s view is the idea that irrealia cannot be primary objects of presentations. When we affirm something, we may mention all kinds of non-real entities. But the judgements we make must be based exclusively on presentations of real things. There are many terms that obscure this fact. Brentano calls these terms “linguistic fictions,” which give the false impression that our thoughts could also concern non-real entities. Brentano’s list of such misleading expressions is long:

One cannot make the being or nonbeing of a centaur an object [i.e. a primary object] as one can a centaur. […] Neither the present, past, nor future, neither present things, past things, nor future things, nor existence and non-existence, nor necessity, nor non-necessity, neither possibility nor impossibility, nor the necessary nor the non-necessary, neither the possible nor the impossible, neither truth nor falsity, neither the true nor the false, nor good nor bad. Nor can […] such abstractions as redness, shape, human nature, and the like, ever be the [primary] objects of a mental reference (F. Brentano: Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, 1973, p. 294).

Commentators have spent a great deal of time examining the arguments Brentano uses to support his Reism (see Sauer 2017, p. 139). His method may be illustrated with the following example. Suppose that someone judges correctly:

Rain is likely to come.

Brentano proposes the following analysis of this statement:

Someone correctly acknowledges rain as a likely event.

This analysis shows that it is not the probability of rain that gets acknowledged, which would be something non-real. If the first statement is equivalent with the second, then the existence of a real thing is sufficient for the truth of both statements. This “truth-maker” is revealed in the second statement: It is a thinking thing that recognizes rain as an impending event, or, as Brentano says, a being that makes the judgement “rain exists” in the mode of the future and with some degree of probability.

With examples like this, Brentano inspired many philosophers in the analytic tradition to use linguistic analysis to promote ontological parsimony. Not many, however, would go as far as Brentano when it comes to analysing perceptual judgements. Brentano is committed to the view that in an act of perception there is only one real thing that must exist: the subject who enjoys the sensory experience. To defend this position, he relies on the following dictum: “What is real does not appear to us, and what appears to us is not real.”

Interpreting this dictum is a serious task. Does Brentano mean to say that all secondary qualities, such as colours, sounds and tastes, are not real because they are mere appearances? Or is he saying that secondary qualities have a special form of “phenomenal reality”? There seem to be good reasons counting against both claims. The phenomenal reality of colours, shapes and tastes counts against classifying them as “non-real,” and the deceptive character that appearances can have counts against a notion of “phenomenal reality” that applies to all appearances across the board. It is only by resolving such questions that a proper understanding of Brentano’s Reism can be achieved.

c. Substance and Accidents

Another classic theme in Aristotelian metaphysics is the relationship between substance and accidents, which include both properties as well as relations. Brentano divides substances into material and immaterial ones, and, in line with his reistic position, holds that both substances and accidents are real things in the broad sense of the word. Material substances are real because they exist independently of our sensory and mental activities. Mental substances, on the other hand, are real things because we innerly perceive them with self-evidence.

Both substances and accidents raise the question of how they exist in space and time. Let us start with space: Brentano holds on to the common view that material substances occupy portions of space (space regions), much in line with a container view of space. Extending this geometric view to mental substances, Brentano considers modeling them as points that occupy no location. To make sense of this idea, he introduces the limiting case of a zero-dimensional topology. It is a limiting case because the lack of any dimensions means that the totality of space in this topology is represented as a single point. Since, by definition, the totality of space does not exist in any other space, we get the desired result that a mental substance occupies no location. In a further step, Brentano then compares material substances with one- or multi-dimensional continua and argues that one can represent mental substances as boundaries of such continua without assigning them a location.  This analogy between mental substances and points on the one hand, and material substances and one- or multidimensional continua on the other, forms the basis of Brentano’s version of substance dualism (on dualism, see below).

What about time? As in the case of space, Brentano represents points of time as boundaries of a continuum. With the exception of the now-point, they are fictions cum fundamentum in re, which Brentano sometimes also calls metaphysical parts. In contrast with space however, Brentano holds that time is not a real continuum. More precisely, it is an unfinished (unfertiges) continuum of which only the now-point is real. This makes Brentano a presentist about the reality of time.  It is a view that seems counterintuitive since it implies that a temporal continuum, such as a melody, can only be perceived at the now point because, strictly speaking, your hearing and your awareness of hearing the melody cannot extend beyond the now point. Brentano’s solution to this problem was to argue for persistence in the tonal presentations of the melody through an original (that is, innate) association between these presentations. When you hear the fourth note of a melody, your presentations of the first three notes are retained, which accounts for the impression of time-consciousness (although technically there is no time consciousness). This account was very influential on Husserl (see Fréchette 2017 on Brentano’s conception of time-consciousness).

Now back to substance. We often characterize substantial change as a change of accidents inhering in a substance. For example, a substance may lose weight; a leaf on a tree may change its color from red to green, thereby losing an accident and gaining a new one. This common view is not Brentano’s view. On the contrary, for Brentano, spatial and temporal accidents are absolute accidents. This means that a substance cannot lose or gain any such properties. To make sense of this, Brentano does two things: first, he turns the traditional view of the substance-accident relation upside down. Instead of seeing the substance as a fundamental being and its accidents as inhering in it, Brentano changes the order: for him, accidents are more fundamental than substances. Second, he rejects inherence as a tie between substance and accident, and replaces it with the parthood relation: In his account, accidents are wholes of which a substance is a part. To illustrate this, take a glass of water which contains 200 ml of water at t_1. After you have taken a sip from the glass, it then contains 170 ml of water at t₂. According to Brentano, what changes are the wholes while the same substance is part of two different wholes at t₁ and t₂. Similarly, Brentano argues, when I heat the water in my cup, the water not only expands in space, but also takes up more or less “space” on a temporal continuum of thermal states. This temporal continuum of thermal states is also a continuum of wholes containing the same substance. Expansion does not require new properties to be added to a substance. It just requires an increase that is measurable on some continuum.

It did not escape Brentano that an Aristotelian realism about universals poses a serious problem. According to this view, universals exist in re, that is, not independently of the substances in which they occur. It follows, in the case of material substances, that an accident can exist in more than one place at the same time. It may also be that an accident ceases to exist altogether when all its instances disappear, but later begins to exist again as soon as there is a new instance in which it occurs.

At this point, one must consider again the role that Brentano assigns to linguistic analysis. Brentano relies on such an analysis when he interprets simple categorical judgements as existential judgements. This analysis should remove the root from which the problem of multiple existence arises. Consider, for example, the simple categorical judgement:

A. Some men are bald-headed.

Brentano reduces this judgement to the following existential judgement:

B. A bald-headed man exists.

In the categorical judgement A, the term “man” denotes a substance and the term “bald-headed” denotes an accident of that substance if the judgement is true. In the existential judgement B, we have a single complex term, “bald-headed man,” which corresponds to a complex presentation, independently of whether a bald man exists or not. The function of the judgement is to acknowledge the existence of the object presented in this way, without adding any further “tie” between substance and accident.

Brentano’s mereology provides us with an ontology that matches this semantic analysis. The idea is the following: The complex term “bald man” denotes a whole, which has two parts (“bald” and “man”), both of which seem to denote parts of this whole. Now, which is here the substance, and which is the accident? Brentano decides that only the term “man” denotes a substance, and only the complex term “bald-headed man” denotes an accident. This means a substance, say the man Socrates, can be part of a whole (e.g. the bald man Socrates) without there having to be another part which must be added to this substance in order for this whole to exist.

Brentano offers us an account of substance that is peculiar because it goes against the principle of supplementation in extensional mereology. Brentano doesn’t follow that intuition: For him, properties like “bald-headedness” are not further parts that add to the substance to make it a whole. He thereby corrects the Aristotelian form of realism about universals at the very point that raises the problem of multiple existence.

d. Dualism, Immortality, God

One of the oldest problems in metaphysics is the so-called “mind-body problem.” Brentano confronts this problem in a traditional as well as in a modern way. The traditional setting is provided by the Aristotelian doctrine that different forms of life are explained by the different kinds of souls that organisms possess. Plants and animals have embodied souls that form the lower levels of the human soul which also includes a “thinking soul” as a higher part. In this framework, the mind-body problem consists of two questions: (1) How do the lower parts of the human soul fulfil their body-bound function?; and (2) how, if at all, does the thinking soul depend on the body?

The modern setting of the mind-body problem is provided by Descartes’ arguments for the immateriality of the soul. These arguments make use of considerations that suggest that the activity of the mind is thinking, and that thinking requires a substance that thinks, but not a body with sensory organs. Following the Cartesian argument, the mind-body problem becomes primarily a problem of causation: (1) how can sensory processes have a causal effect on the thinking mind; and (2) how can our thoughts have a causal effect on our behavior?

Brentano’s ambitious aim in his Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint was to bridge the gap between these two historical frameworks. If he succeeded, he would be able to use Cartesian ideas to answer questions arising within the Aristotelian framework, and he would be able to use Aristotelian ideas to answer questions about mental causation. But since Brentano left his Psychology unfinished, we do not know for sure how Brentano hoped to resolve the question, “whether it is conceivable that mental life continues after the dissolution of the body” (Brentano 1973, xxvii).

While Brentano did not get to the part of his Psychology that was meant to deal with the immortality question, he prepares this discussion in a chapter on the unity of consciousness. He begins with the following observation:

We are forced to take the multiplicity of the various acts of sensing […] as well as the inner perception which provides us with knowledge of all of them, as parts of one single phenomenon in which they are contained, as one single and unified thing (Brentano 1973, p. 97).

Here Brentano is only talking about the unity of the experience we have when, for example, we simultaneously hear and see a musician playing an instrument. But the same idea can be extended when we think about our own future. Suppose I am looking forward to a vacation trip I have planned. There is a special unity involved in this because I could be planning a trip without looking forward to it, and I could be looking forward to a trip that someone else is planning. In the present case, however, my intention and my joy are linked, and in a double way. Both phenomena relate to the same object: my future self that enjoys the trip. Using examples like this, an argument for the immortality of the soul could be made along the following lines:

1. The unity I perceive between my intentions and the pleasures I feel now does not rely on any local part of my body.
2. If it doesn’t rely on any part of my body now, it will not rely on my body in the future.
3. Therefore, the unity I perceive now may well outlive my body.

While the question of immortality concerns the end of our life, there is also a question about its beginning: How does it come that each human being has an individual soul?  Brentano takes up this question in a lengthy debate with the philologist and philosopher Eduard Zeller. The subject of this debate was whether Aristotle could be credited with the so-called “creationist” view, according to which the existence of each individual soul is due to God’s creation. Brentano affirms such an interpretation, and we may assume that it coincides with his own view of the matter. It is a view that presupposes a fundamental difference between human and non-human creatures, but also allows some continuity in the way souls enter the bodies of living creatures:

Lest this divine intercession should appear too incredible, Aristotle calls attention to the fact that the powers of the lower elements do not suffice for the genesis of any living being whatever. Rather, the forces of the heavenly substances participate in a certain way as a cause, thereby making such beings more godlike. The participation of the deity in the creation of man, therefore, has its analogy in the generation of lower life (Brentano 1978, 111ff.).

What this suggests is that individual souls of all kinds are created in such a way that God’s contribution to the process is recognisable. This is remarkable, because it means that the human soul owes its existence to a process of creation that is in many ways analogous to processes that enable the existence of plants and animals.

Such considerations fit nicely into the Aristotelian framework of the mind-body problem. Some scholars have therefore questioned whether Brentano could also advocate a Cartesian substance dualism. Dieter Münch for instance suggests that there are clear traces of a “monistic tendency” in Brentano (D. Münch, 1995/96, p. 137).

On the other hand, we also find in Brentano considerations that favor the Cartesian framework. For example, when Brentano offers a psychological proof of the existence of God, he follows closely in the footsteps of Descartes (On the Existence of God, sections 435-464). In this proof, Brentano criticizes what he calls an “Aristotelian semi-materialism,” and argues that the unity of consciousness is incompatible with any form of materialism. The tension between these arguments (which may have been modified somewhat by Brentano’s disciples) and the passages quoted above seems difficult to resolve. We may take this as a sign that the gap between the Aristotelian and Cartesian frameworks is too wide to be bridged (see Textor 2017).

5. History of Philosophy and Metaphilosophy

Brentano’s contributions to the history of philosophy are above all an expression of his meta-philosophical optimism. Brentano believed that philosophy develops according to a model that distinguishes phases of progress and phases of decline. Phases of progress are relatively rare and followed by much longer phases of decline. Only a few philosophers, such as Aristotle, Thomas Aquinas, Leibniz and Descartes, fulfill the highest standards which Brentano applies. Nevertheless, he was optimistic that another phase of progress will come, and that it will provide concrete solutions to philosophical problems.

Brentano’s phase model is undoubtedly speculative. It is the result of his reflections on how to approach the history of philosophy. In his view, it makes a big difference whether one studies the history of philosophy as an historian or as a philosopher. Brentano tried to convey to his students the relevance of this distinction, and it is for this purpose that he most often invoked his phase model.

a. How to do History of Philosophy

In a lecture given to the Viennese Philosophical Society in 1888, entitled “On the Method of Historical Research in the Field of Philosophy” (a draft of which has been published in Franz Brentano: Geschichte der Philosophie der Neuzeit (1987, pp. 81-105)), Brentano hands out his recommendations for doing history of philosophy. One should “approach the author’s thought in a philosophical way,” he says. This requires two critical competences: a specific hermeneutic competence, and a broad understanding of the main currents of progress and decline in philosophy.

The hermeneutic competence Brentano requires “consists in allowing oneself to be penetrated, as it were, by the spirit of the philosopher whose teachings one is studying” (ibid., p. 90). In his debate with Zeller, Brentano uses this requirement as an argument against a purely historical interpretation of Aristotle’s texts:

One must try to resemble as closely as possible the spirit whose imperfectly expressed thoughts one wants to understand. In other words, one must prepare the way for understanding by first meeting the philosopher philosophically, before concluding as a historian (Brentano: Aristoteles’ Lehre vom Ursprung des menschlischen Geistes (1911), p. 165).

The second requirement, namely an awareness of the main currents structuring the development of philosophy, brings us back to Brentano’s phase model. Such models were popular among historians at Brentano’s time. One of these historians was Ernst von Lasaulx, whose lectures Brentano attended as a student in Munich (see Schäfer 2020). A few years later, Brentano came across Auguste Comte’s model and put it to critical examination (see Brentano’s lecture “The Four Phases of Philosophy and its Current State” (1895).

Brentano believes that progress of philosophy results from a combination of metaphysical interest with a strictly scientific attitude. He therefore disagrees with Comte on three points. Firstly, Comte fails to notice the repetitive cycles of progress and decline. Secondly, he does not see the classical period of Greek philosophy as a phase in which philosophers were driven by a purely theoretical interest. And thirdly, Comte mistakenly believes that modern philosophy had to pass through a theological and metaphysical phase before it could enter its scientific phase.

The broad perspective that Brentano takes on the history of philosophy leads him to cast a shadow over all philosophers who belong to a phase of decline. But this is not the only form of criticism to be found in Brentano. There are also independent and highly illuminating discussions of the works of Thomas Reid and Ernst Mach, as well as profound criticisms of Windelband, Sigwart and other logicians of Brentano’s time. From today’s point of view, these are all important contributions to the history of philosophy.

b. Aristotle’s Worldview

For Brentano, the study of Aristotle’s works was a major source of inspiration and went hand in hand with the development of his own ideas. Almost all his works contain commentaries on Aristotle, often in the form of a fictitious dialogue in which Brentano tested the viability of his own ideas and sought support for his own views from a historical authority.

Brentano was concerned with Aristotle’s philosophy throughout his life, from his early writings on ontology (1862) and psychology (1867), through his debate with Eduard Zeller on the origin of the human soul (1883), to his treatise on Aristotle’s worldview a few years before his death. Throughout these studies, we can observe Brentano applying his hermeneutic method to fill in the gaps he finds in Aristotle’s argumentation and to resolve apparent contradictions.

In his final treatment of Aristotle, Brentano focuses on the doctrine of wisdom as the highest form of knowledge. He approaches this problem by not confining himself to what Aristotle says in the Metaphysics, but “by using incidental remarks from various works” (Aristotle and His World View, p. ix), and by including commentaries such as Theophrastus’s Metaphysics. With the help of Theophrastus and other sources, he hopes to resolve what he believes are only apparent contradictions in Aristotle’s writings. Brentano’s ultimate aim in these late texts is to present his own doctrine of wisdom as the highest form of knowledge (see the manuscripts published in the volume Über Aristoteles 1986).

Another thorny issue taken up by Brentano is Aristotle’s analysis of induction. Brentano praises Aristotle for having recognized the importance of induction for empirical knowledge when, for example, he discussed the question of how we can deduce the spherical shape of the moon from observing its phases. It was, however, “left for a much later age to shed full light, by means of the probability calculus, upon the theory of measure of justified confidence in induction and analogy” (Aristotle and his World View, p. 35). Brentano’s own attempt to solve the problem of induction is tentative. Its solution, he says, will depend on the extent to which the future mathematical analysis of the concept of probability coincides with the intuitive judgements of common sense (ibid.).

Brentano follows in Aristotle’s footsteps in treating metaphysics as a discipline that includes not only ontology, but also cosmology and (natural) theology. The pinnacle of metaphysics, for Brentano, would be a proof of the existence of God. Brentano already hints at this idea in his fifth habilitation thesis: “The multiplicity in the world refutes pantheism and the unity in it refutes atheism” (Brentano, 1867).

Brentano has worked extensively on a proof of God’s existence that relies both on a priori and a posteriori forms of reasoning (see Brentano: On the Existence of God. 1987).

Here, too, it is not difficult to find the Aristotelian roots of Brentano’s thinking. In a manuscript from May 1901, Brentano writes: “Aristotle called theology the first philosophy because, just as God is the first among all things, the knowledge of God (in the factual, if not in the temporal order) is the first among all knowledge” (Religion and Philosophy, 90).

We can see from these late writings that there were at least two constants in Brentano’s work: one is his engagement with Aristotle, another one is his theism. But these early imprints are not the only ones. There is yet another historical source that became decisive for Brentano early on, namely the contemporary positivism of Mill, Spencer and Comte.

c. Positivism and the Renewal of Philosophy

In 1859, the Franco-Luxemburgish philosopher and sociologist Théophile Funck, who became Brentano’s brother-in-law in 1860, published a book entitled Philosophie et lois de l’histoire, in which he connects the positivist movement with a model of historical development resembling Brentano’s phase model. How much Brentano was impressed by positivism at this point in time can be seen in his review of another book by the same author:

In the most recent epoch there has appeared in the person of Auguste Comte a thinker lacking neither the enthusiastic zeal for the most sublime questions, nor the insight capable of linking ideas, which elevate the truly great philosopher above the mass of lesser minds. Mill doesn’t hesitate to put him on the same level as Descartes and Leibniz, he even calls him superior to them, if not deeper, if only because he was able to bring to bear a similar spiritual force in a more advanced cultural epoch (Brentano 1876, 3. Our transl.).

This enthusiasm for Comte’s philosophy may have changed in light of the anti-metaphysical tendencies in Comte’s thought and his reservations about psychology becoming a proper science. But there are other factors, too, that may have played a role in this context: For example, the discovery of Mill’s monograph on Comte, which Brentano read in French translation in 1868, may have suggested to him a fundamental agreement between British empiricism and French positivism. Also, at this young age, Brentano was preparing for an academic career in philosophy as a Catholic priest. This was a difficult task in Germany in those days. Brentano had to expect fierce opposition to his beliefs, especially in Würzburg. The study of English and French positivism may have seemed to him an appropriate means of countering such resistance.

One way of preparing for this opposition was to ensure that his psychology had a firm empirical basis. To do this, Brentano wanted to show that mental phenomena are subject to distinct laws which are nevertheless similar or analogous to the laws of physics. Here, Brentano could rely on his doctrine that philosophy (including psychology) and the natural sciences share a common method, a doctrine which he defended as one of his theses for the habilitation. But Brentano had yet to substantiate this claim with concrete examples. In this respect, the debate on the Weber-Fechner law provided him with a welcome opportunity.

Brentano states the law as follows: “It has been found that the increase of the physical stimulus which produces a just barely noticeable increase in the strength of the sensations always bears a constant relation to the magnitude of the stimulus to which it is added” (Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, p. 67). Brentano, then, goes on to correct what he takes to be a common mistake in applying this law:

Since it was assumed to be self-evident that each barely noticeable increase of sensation is to be regarded as equal, the law was formulated that the intensity of sensation increases by equal amounts when the relative increase of the physical stimulus is the same. In reality, it is by no means self-evident that each barely noticeable increase in sensation is equal, but only that it is equally noticeable (ibid.).

This example highlights two key moves in Brentano’s thinking. While he fully acknowledges the significance of the Weber-Fechner law, he points out a mistake in the formulation of the law. It takes the sharp eye of a philosopher, trained in making precise conceptual distinctions, to reveal this mistake. For Brentano, the consequence is that there are two kinds of laws which together explain the experimental findings by Weber and Fechner: a physiological law, as well as a law of descriptive psychology. These laws are perfectly tuned to each other, which shows that they are similar or at least analogous (For details on the Fechner-Brentano debate, see the introduction by Mauro Antonelli to Brentano and Fechner 2015 and Seron 2023).

In conclusion, it must be admitted that Brentano’s attitude to the positivist tradition remains somewhat ambiguous. This can also be seen in his criticism of Ernst Mach, who was appointed professor of philosophy at the University of Vienna in the same year that Brentano left the city. They shared the ambition of renewing philosophy by drawing upon the resources of the natural sciences. However, Brentano could not accept Mach’s theory of sensation, and the monism it implies. He believed that a firm distinction between physical and mental phenomena precluded such monism (see Brentano: Über Ernst Mach’s “Erkenntnis und Irrtum” 1905/1906, first published in 1988).

d. Philosophical Optimism

Brentano was a philosophical optimist through and through, firmly convinced that philosophy not only had a great past, but an even greater future ahead of it. He emphasized the continuity between the endeavors of philosophy and the empirical sciences, and he attacked in his lectures with great eloquence a cultural pessimism that was popular at the time. In addition, he backed up his optimism with his theistic worldview.

In his lecture “On the Reasons for a Loss of Confidence in the Area of Philosophy” (1874), Brentano admits that so far philosophy has not been able to keep pace with the progress of the natural sciences. It lacks continuity, consensus, and practical usefulness. However, Brentano denies that this is a permanent deficiency and counters the widespread view that the questions of philosophy cannot be treated as precisely as scientific questions. He therefore urges philosophers to orient themselves more closely to the natural sciences and, in particular, to take advantage of the new findings of physiology: “Now that even physiology is beginning to thrive more vigorously, we no longer lack for signs pointing to the time for philosophy, too, to awaken to productive life” (Brentano: “On the Reasons for a Loss of Confidence in the Area of Philosophy” 2022, 499).

With such colorful words, Brentano’s aim was to instill in his students a belief in the integrity of philosophy as a rigorous discipline. If this was not good enough to convince his audience, Brentano reminded them of the human capacity to search for ultimate reasons, thereby appealing to a religious impulse in some of his students. One of them was Alfred Kastil, who often changed Brentano’s words as an editor, but claims that the following passage comes from from one of Brentano’s manuscripts:

Man demands by nature not merely a knowledge of what is [Kenntnis des Dass], but also a knowledge of why [Kenntnis des Warum]. For this reason alone, the knowledge of God, as that of the first reason, is a great good, but it is also so insofar as the most joyful conception of the world, the most blissful hopes are attached to it (Brentano: Religion und Philosophie, 253 fn. Our translation).

Yet it would be be rash to reduce Brentano’s philosophical optimism to religious enthusiasm. Looking back on his own life, he speaks of the “duty of the wise man, having reached the age of maturity, to subject his religious convictions to an examination”, and in doing so, with all due respect for popular religion, to retain the freedom to oppose the unauthorized restrictions on research by an “ecclesiastical government” (Ibid., p. 251).

Clearly, Brentano’s conflict with the Catholic Church and the Austrian state left deep marks on his personality. But it was not only religious institutions that Brentano opposed. As a philosopher, he fought all his life against Kantian philosophy and the scepticism and relativism he saw as its corollary. And although he saw much of philosophy as grounded in psychology, he fought against the popular view that such psychologism implied a form of subjectivism.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Monographs published by Brentano

• On the Several Senses of Being in Aristotle. Transl. R George. Berkeley: University of California Press 1975. [first published in 1862]
  • Brentano’s PhD dissertation. Argues that being in the sense of the categories is the most basic meaning of being according to Aristotle.
• The Psychology of Aristotle, Especially His Doctrine of the Nous Poietikos. Trans. R. George. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1977. [first published in 1867]
  • Brentano’s habilitation thesis in which he challenges the traditional view of the active intellect in Aristotle.
• The Origin of Our Knowledge of Right and Wrong. Transl. R. M. Chisholm and E.H. Schneewind. London: Routledge 1960. [first published in 1889]
  • An expanded version of Brentano’s lecture bearing the same title, along with extensive footnotes and additions, which elaborate and defend his conception of the Good in terms of correct love.
• Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint. Trans. A. C. Rancurello, D. B. Terrell, and L. L. McAlister. London: Routledge 1973. [first published in 1874]
  • Brentano’s most important book, conceived as the first two parts of a six volume treatise on psychology, four of which were never published, in which Brentano develops his conception of psychology as an empirical science based on inner perception.
• Von der Klassifikation der psychischen Phänomene. Berlin: Duncker & Humblot, 1911. [On the Classification of Mental Phenomena]
  • Reprint of the second book of his Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint along with an important appendix, appendix in which Brentano explains some changes regarding his earlier views. Included in the English translation of the Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint.
• Untersuchungen zur Sinnespsychologie. 1907. [Investigations on Sensory Psychology]
  • A collection of papers previously published between 1890 and 1906 on sensory psychology. These papers are largely based on the Vienna lectures on descriptive psychology. Not yet translated into English.
• Aristotle and his Worldview. Transl. R. George and R.M. Chisholm. Berkeley: University of California Press 1978 [first published in 1911]
  • Originally published as a chapter of an edited book on the great figures of philosophy and expanded into a book. Offers a general presentation of Aristotle’s metaphysics, in many respects influenced by Theophrastus’ reading of Aristotle.
• Aristoteles Lehre vom Ursprung des menschlichen Geistes. Leipzig: Veit & Comp. 1911. [Aristotle’s Doctrine of the Origins of the Human Mind]
  • Brentano’s last word on the origin of the human soul in Aristotle in his debate with Eduard Zeller. , Not yet translated into English.

b. Other Philosophical Works Published by Brentano

• “Habilitation Theses”. Transl. S. Gabriel. In I. Tănăsescu, et. al. (eds.), Brentano and the Positive Philosophy of Comte and Mill. Berlin: DeGruyter 2022, 433-436. [first published in 1867]
  • A list of 25 theses (originally in Latin) that Brentano defended for his habilitation.
• “Auguste Comte and Positive Philosophy”. Transl. S. Gabriel. In I. Tănăsescu, et. al. (eds.), Brentano and the Positive Philosophy of Comte and Mill. Berlin: DeGruyter 2022, 437-455. [first published in 1869]
  • The first and only published article out of a series of eight articles planned in which Brentano critically examines Comte’s conception of philosophy, his classification of sciences and on his view on the cycles and phases of history of philosophy.
• “Der Atheismus und die Wissenschaft”. 1873. [“Atheism and Science”] Reprinted in: Franz Brentano: Sämtliche veröffentlichte Schriften. Hgg. Von Th. Binder und A. Chrudzimski. Volume IX: Vermischte Schriften. Berlin. DeGruyter 2019, 37-61.
  • Brentano’s reply to an article in a Viennese newspaper published anonymously a few weeks earlier. Not yet translated into English.
• “Der neueste philosophische Versuch in Frankreich”. 1876. Reprinted in: Franz Brentano: Sämtliche veröffentlichte Schriften. Hgg. Von Th. Binder und A. Chrudzimski. Volume III: Schriften zur Ethik und Ästhetik. Berlin. DeGruyter 2011, 3-17.
  • Brentano’s anonymous review of a book by T. Funck-Brentano.
• “Das Genie”. Berlin: Duncker & Humblot. 1892. [On Genious]. Reprinted in: Franz Brentano: Sämtliche veröffentlichte Schriften. Hgg. Von Th. Binder und A. Chrudzimski. Volume III: Schriften zur Ethik und Ästhetik. Berlin. DeGruyter 2019, 99-127.
  • Offers an exposition of his aesthetics according to which beauty is a property of acts of presentation and gives an account of the genetic preconditions of beautiful presentations. Not yet translated into English.
• “On the Reasons for a Loss of Confidence in the Area of Philosophy”. Transl. S. Gabriel. In I. Tănăsescu, et. al. (eds.), Brentano and the Positive Philosophy of Comte and Mill. Berlin: DeGruyter 2022, 489-500. [first published in 1874]
  • Brentano’s Inaugural Lecture at the University of Vienna, in which he articulates his optimism about the progress in philosophy.
• “Miklosich über subjektlose Sätze”. 1883. [Miklosich on sentences without subject terms]. Reprinted in: Franz Brentano: Sämtliche veröffentlichte Schriften. Hgg. Von Th. Binder und A. Chrudzimski. Volume IX: Vermischte Schriften. Berlin. DeGruyter 2019, 105-115.
  • An appreciative review of a short treatise by Franz Miklosich, a contemporary linguist, which Brentano included (minus the final paragraph) as an appendix in Our Knowledge of Right and Wrong (1889).
• “The Four Phases of Philosophy and Its Current State.” Trans. B. M. Mezei and B. Smith. In Balázs M. Mezei and Barry Smith (eds.), The Four Phases of Philosophy. Amsterdam: Rodopi. [first published in 1895]
  • Brentano’s exposition of his cyclic view of the history of philosophy in phases of ascent and decline.
• “On the Future of Philosophy” Transl. S. Gabriel. In I. Tănăsescu, et. al. (eds.), Brentano and the Positive Philosophy of Comte and Mill. Berlin: DeGruyter 2022, 523-570. [first published in 1893]
  • Brentano’s very critical reply to a lecture on political education delivered by Adolf Exner on the occasion of Exner’s inauguration as rector of the University of Vienna.

c. Selected Works Published Posthumously from Brentano’s Nachlass

Since Brentano’s death, many editions of his manuscripts and lectures have been produced. Given the editorial policy of his first editors, which consisted in adapting the text to what they took to be Brentano’s considered view on these matters, some of these texts are heavily edited and not always historically reliable.

• Philosophy of Mind and Psychology
• Sensory and Noetic Consciousness. Transl. M. Schättle and L.L. McAlister. London: Routledge, 1981.
  • A collection of manuscripts on psychology and metaphysics, misleadingly presented as the third book of the Psychology from the empirical Standpoint.
• Descriptive Psychology. Trans. B. Müller. London: Routledge 1995.
  • Material from the lecture courses held in Vienna in the late 1880s, which Husserl often refers to.
• Briefwechsel über Psychophysics 1874-1878. [Correspondence on Psychophysics 1874-1878] Berlin: DeGruyter 2015. With an Introduction by Mauro Antonelli.
  • Brentano’s correspondence with Gustav Fechner.
• Epistemology and Truth
• Versuch über die Erkenntnis [Essay on Knowledge]. Leipzig: Felix Meiner 1925.
  • Contains an edition of the treatise Nieder mit den Vorurteilen! [Down with prejudices!], the most explicit attack of Brentano on Kant’s notion of the synthetic apriori.
• The True and the Evident. Trans. R. M. Chisholm, I. Politzer, and K. R. Fischer. London: Routledge 1966.
  • Manuscripts and lectures from the period between 1889 and 1915 on truth and ontology, including the lecture “On the concept of truth”.
• Logic, Ethics, and Aesthetics
• Die Lehre vom richtigen Urteil [The Theory of Correct Judgement]. Bern: Francke 1956.
  • An edition of Brentano’s logic lectures, dealing among other things with the existential reduction of judgements.
• The Foundation and Construction of Ethics. Trans. E. H. Schneewind. London: Routledge 1973.
  • An edition of various lectures by Brentano on practical philosophy.
• Grundzüge der Ästhetik [Outlines of Aesthetics]. Bern: Francke 1959.
  • Brentano’s Vienna lectures on psychology and aesthetics, which include an account of the distinction between intuitive and conceptual presentations.
• Ontology and Cosmology
• Die Abkehr vom Nichtrealen. [The Turn Away from the Non-Real]. Bern: Francke 1966.
  • A collection of selected letters from Brentano to Marty and his later students on the motives which led Brentano to adopt Reism.
• The Theory of Categories. Trans. R. M. Chisholm and N. Guterman. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff 1981.
  • A collection of manuscripts of the late Brentano on metaphysics.
• Philosophical Investigations on Space, Time, and the Continuum. Trans. B. Smith. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul 1988.
  • A collection of manuscripts of the late Brentano dealing in detail with his mereology and his conception of boundaries.
• Religion and Christian Belief
• On the Existence of God. Trans. S. Krantz. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff 1987.
  • An edition of various lectures on metaphysics (especially cosmology) and on the proofs of the existence of God.
• Religion und Philosophie [Religion and Philosophy]. Bern: Francke 1954.
  • A collection of numerous essays on cosmology and immortality, as well as on wisdom, chance and theodicy.
• The Teachings of Jesus and Their Enduring Significance. New York: Springer 2021.
  • Further studies prepared shortly before Brentano’s death offering a final word on his conception of Christian belief.
• On the History of Philosophy
• Über Aristoteles [On Aristotle]. Hamburg: Felix Meiner 1986.
  • A collection of manuscripts on Aristotle, along with correspondence on related topics.
• Geschichte der Philosophie der Neuzeit [History of Modern Philosophy]. Hamburg: Meiner 1987.
  • Material on Brentano’s lecture course on the history of philosophy from Bacon to Schopenhauer, as well as notes for his lecture on the proper method of doing history of philosophy.
• Über Ernst Machs Erkenntnis und Irrtum [On Ernst Mach’s Knowledge and Error]. Amsterdam: Rodopi 1988.
  • Manuscripts and excerpts of lectures in which Brentano critically examines Mach’s positivism.

d. Secondary Sources

Here is secondary literature on Brentano. A valuable selection of earlier literature on Brentano up to 2010 can be found in the 4-volume collection Franz Brentano: Critical Assessment, edited by M. Antonelli and F. Boccaccini, Routledge 2019.

Works with an asterisk * are quoted in the text.

• Antonelli, Mauro, and Thomas Binder. The Philosophy of Brentano. Studien zur Österreichischen Philosophie Vol. 49: Brill 2021.
• Antonelli, M, and F. Boccaccini. Franz Brentano: Critical Assessment. Routledge Critical Assessment of Leading Philosophers. 4 volumes. Routledge 2019.
• Antonelli, Mauro, and Federico Boccaccini. Brentano. Mente, Coscienza, Realtà. Carocci, 2021.
• *Binder, Thomas: Franz Brentano und sein philosophischer Nachlass. DeGruyter 2019.
• *Brandl, Johannes L.; “Was Brentano an Early Deflationist about Truth?”, The Monist 100 (2017), 1-14.
• *Brandl, Johannes L. (eds.). Brentano on Intentional Inexistence and Intentionality as the Mark of the Mental. Special Issue of Grazer Philosophische Studien. Volume 100 (2023).
• *Citlak, Amadeusz: “Qualitative Psychology of the Brentano School and its inspirations”,, Theory and Psychology (2023), 1-22.
• *Crane, Tim. Aspects of Psychologism. Harvard University Press, 2014.
• Curvello, Flávio Vieira. “Brentano on Scientific Philosophy and Positivism.” Kriterion: Revista de Filosofia 62 (2021): 657-79.
• Dewalque, Arnauld. “Brentano’s Case for Optimism.” Rivista di filosofia neoscolastica, CXL, 4 (2019): 835-47.
• Fisette, Denis. La philosophie de Franz Brentano. Vrin 2022.
• Fisette, Denis, and Guillaume Fréchette. Themes from Brentano. Vol. 44: Rodopi 2013.
• Fisette, Denis, Guillaume Fréchette, and Hynek Janoušek. Franz Brentano’s Philosophy after One Hundred Years: From History of Philosophy to Reism. Springer Nature, 2021.
• Fisette, Denis, Guillaume Fréchette, and Friedrich Stadler. Franz Brentano and Austrian Philosophy. Springer, 2020.
• Fréchette, Guillaume. “Brentano on Time-Consciousness.” In: U. Kriegel (eds.): The Routledge Handbook of Franz Brentano and The Brentano School. New York 2017, 75-86.
• Fréchette, Guillaume, and Hamid Taieb. “Descriptive Psychology: Franz Brentano’s Project Today.” European Journal of Philosophy 2023.
• *Gabriel, Susan. “Brentano at the Intersection of Psychology, Ontology, and the Good.” Themes from Brentano. Brill, 2013. 247-71.
• *Huemer, Wolfgang. „Was Brentano a Systematic Philosopher?” In: Antonelli, Mauro, and Thomas Binder. The Philosophy of Brentano. Studien zur Österreichischen Philosophie Vol. 49: Brill 2021, 11-27.
• Kriegel, Uriah. The Routledge Handbook of Franz Brentano and the Brentano School. Taylor & Francis, 2017.
• *Kriegel, Uriah. Brentano’s Philosophical System: Mind, Being, Value. Oxford University Press, 2018.
• Massin, Olivier and Mulligan Kevin. Décrire: La Psychologie De Franz Brentano. Vrin: 2021).
• *Münch, Dieter. “Die Einheit Von Geist und Leib: Brentanos Habilitationsschrift über Die Psychologie des Aristoteles als Antwort auf Zeller.” Brentano Studien. Internationales Jahrbuch der Franz Brentano Forschung 6 (1996), 125-144.
• *Rollinger, Robin D. “Brentano’s Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint: Its Background and Conception.” In: I. Tănăsescu: Franz Brentano’s Metaphysics and Psychology  (2012): 261-309.
• Rollinger, Robin D. Concept and Judgment in Brentano’s Logic Lectures: Analysis and Materials. Vol. 48: Brill 2020.
• *Sauer, Werner. “Brentano’s Reism.” The Routledge Handbook of Franz Brentano and the Brentano School. Routledge, 2017. 133-43.
• Schaefer, Richard. “Learning from Lasaulx: The Origins of Brentano’s Four Phases Theory.” Franz Brentano and Austrian Philosophy. Brill (2020): 181-96.
• *Seron, Denis. “Psychology First!” The Philosophy of Brentano. Brill, 2021. 141-55.
• *Seron, Denis. “The Fechner-Brentano Controversy on the Measurement of Sensation.” In: D. Fisette et. al. (eds.): Franz Brentano and Austrian Philosophy. Springer, 2020, 344-67.
• *Soldati, Gianfranco. “Brentano on Self-Knowledge.” In: U. Kriegel: The Routledge Handbook of Franz Brentano and the Brentano School. Taylor & Francis, 2017, pp. 124-129.
• Tănăsescu, Ion. Franz Brentano’s Metaphysics and Psychology. Zeta Books 2012.
• Tănăsescu, Ion, et al. Brentano and the Positive Philosophy of Comte and Mill: With Translations of Original Writings on Philosophy as Science by Franz Brentano. De Gruyter 2022.
• Tassone, Biagio G. From Psychology to Phenomenology: Franz Brentano’s ‘Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint’ and Contemporary Philosophy of Mind. Palgrave-Macmillan 2012.
• Textor, Mark. Brentano’s Mind. Oxford University Press 2017.
• Textor, Mark. “Correctness First: Brentano on Judgment and Truth.” The Act and Object of Judgment: Historical and Philosophical Perspectives. Eds. Ball, Brian Andrew and Christoph Schuringa: Routledge, 2019.
• *Textor, Mark. “From Mental Holism to the Soul and Back.” The Monist 100.1 (2017): 133-54.
• Textor, Mark. “That’s Correct! Brentano on Intuitive Judgement.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 31.4 (2022): 805-24.

Author Information

Johannes Brandl
Email: johannes.brandl@plus.ac.at
University of Salzburg
Austria

and

Guillaume Frechette
Email: guillaume.frechette@unige.ch
University of Geneva
Switzerland

William Hazlitt (1778 – 1830)

William Hazlitt is best known as a brilliant essayist and critic. His essays include criticism of art, poetry, fiction, and drama. He wrote social and political commentary, portraits of major writers and political figures of his age, and a biography of his great hero, Napoleon. He had intended to follow his father into the Unitarian ministry but became instead a painter of portraits before settling into a career as a writer. His earliest writing is philosophical, and his key ideas are incorporated into his later work as a critic and conversational essayist.

Hazlitt was acquainted with many of the leading figures of the period, including Wordsworth and Coleridge, Keats and Shelley, the philosopher William Godwin, and the essayists Leigh Hunt and Charles Lamb. Like other political radicals of the time, he was persecuted by the Tory press, being referred to disparagingly by one periodical as belonging, with Keats and Hunt, to the ‘Cockney School’. His most notorious work, Liber Amoris (1823), gave ammunition to his enemies by candidly recounting the story of his infatuation with Sarah Walker, the daughter of his landlady, for whom he divorced his wife only to be rejected. He died in 1830, at the age of 52.

Hazlitt was educated at New College, Hackney, a Dissenting academy, where he acquired a thorough grounding in philosophy and literature. He left prematurely, but not before he had begun developing the ideas that he later described as his ‘metaphysical discovery’ and that formed the core arguments of his first book, An Essay on the Principles of Human Action (1805). In this he argues against psychological egoism, materialism, associationism, and a Lockean account of personal identity. He argues for the formative power of the mind and the natural disinterestedness of human action regarding future benefits for oneself and others.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Early Philosophical Works
   1. The ‘Metaphysical Discovery’
   2. Hartley and Helvétius
   3. History of Philosophy
   4. Kant and Idealism
3. Political Thought
   1. Early Political Writing
   2. Virtue and Liberty
   3. The People
   4. The Press and Freedom of Speech
4. The Essayist as Philosopher
   1. Late Twentieth and Early Twenty-First Century Studies
   2. Abstraction and the Poetic
   3. Power and the Poetic
   4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading

1. Life

Hazlitt was born on April 10, 1778, in Maidstone, in the English county of Kent. His Irish father, also named William Hazlitt, was a Presbyterian minister, an author of theological and philosophical works, and a friend of leading Dissenting thinkers such as Joseph Priestley and Richard Price. His mother, Grace, was from an English Dissenting family. In 1780 the family moved to Bandon, County Cork, Ireland. Running into political difficulties with the local community, the Rev. Hazlitt moved the family again, this time to the United States, where he founded the first Unitarian church in Boston but failed to become established. The family returned to England in 1787, to the village of Wem, near Shrewsbury, Shropshire.

William started his formal education in the small school run by his father. He also had periods of schooling in Liverpool, from where he wrote home, precociously, about the injustice of the slave trade and of the Test and Corporation Acts. William intended to follow his father into the Presbyterian, specifically Unitarian, ministry. Because Unitarianism is a rational and politically liberal Dissenting tradition, the family welcomed the French Revolution in 1789. In July 1791 the Birmingham home, library, and laboratory of Joseph Priestley were destroyed by a mob. Young William penned a passionate letter in defence of Priestley, which was published in the Shrewsbury Chronicle.

In 1793 Hazlitt left Wem and the oversight of his father to begin his formal training for the ministry at New College, Hackney, just north of London. This was a Dissenting Academy for the education of lay and ministerial students. If its building rivalled Oxford and Cambridge colleges for grandeur, the curriculum exceeded them in its breadth and its pedagogy in its promotion of free enquiry and philosophical debate. Robert Southey wrote that students ‘came away believers in blind necessity and gross materialism – and nothing else’. Internal disputes and financial difficulties, as well as its reputation as a hotbed of sedition, were already starting to destabilise the college. Many of the students were restless, radicalised by works such as Godwin’s Enquiry Concerning Political Justice (1793) or distracted by the theatres and other pleasures afforded by its proximity to London. Hazlitt left prematurely, having lost his sense of a vocation, but the college had given him a solid grounding in philosophy and literature; and he may already have made the ‘metaphysical discovery’ that would form the basis of his first book.

Hazlitt chose to follow his brother John into a career as a portrait painter, and to live and train with him in London. He soon met leading radicals and thinkers, including William Godwin and Joseph Fawcett. 1798 was a landmark year, as he recalls in his 1823 essay ‘My First Acquaintance with Poets’ (CW 12). When Samuel Taylor Coleridge came to Shrewsbury, to consider a vacancy as a Unitarian minister, Hazlitt went to hear him preach, and later at dinner in Wem, the poet ‘dilated in a very edifying manner on Mary Wollstonecraft and [James] Mackintosh’. Coleridge stayed the night; in the morning he received a letter from Thomas Wedgewood offering him £150 a year to relinquish his ministerial intentions and devote himself to poetry and philosophy, which he immediately accepted. Any disappointment Hazlitt felt was assuaged by the poet’s invitation to visit him at Nether Stowey in Somerset. Delighted, the nineteen-year-old William accompanied Coleridge back to Shrewsbury. On this walk, Hazlitt attempted, with difficulty, to outline the argument of his ‘metaphysical discovery’.

His stay later that year with Coleridge at Nether Stowey, and with Wordsworth at nearby Alfoxton, was another formative experience. The diarist Henry Crabb Robinson, who first met Hazlitt at this time, describes him as a shy and somewhat tongue-tied young man, but also as the cleverest person he knew. By now it was becoming clear that the tide was turning against the radicals and reformers. At a lecture, ‘On the Law of Nature and Nations’, Hazlitt heard James Mackintosh renounce his support for the Revolution and radicalism. Thereafter Hazlitt had nothing but contempt for apostasy of this kind.

Hazlitt painted portraits in Manchester, Liverpool, and Bury St Edmunds. A portrait of his father was exhibited at the Royal Academy in 1802. On a visit to Paris, he caught a glimpse of his hero, Napoleon, and spent hours copying works by Titian, Raphael, and Poussin in the Louvre. He told an Englishman who praised his work that rapid sketching was his forte and that, after the first hour or two, he generally made his pictures worse. He later wrote about his career as a painter in essays such as ‘On the Pleasure of Painting’ (CW 18).

When he was twenty-five, Hazlitt visited the Lake District in Northern England, where Coleridge and Wordsworth were living. The poets regarded him as a moody and easily enraged young man but possessed of real genius. However, the stay ended badly. In 1815, Wordsworth gave an account of the episode to Crabb Robinson as an explanation for his coolness towards Hazlitt. According to this (not necessarily reliable) account, Wordsworth had rescued Hazlitt from a ducking following Hazlitt’s assault of a local woman.

An important new friendship dates from October 1804. Charles Lamb was an old schoolmate and friend of Coleridge and was already a published poet and journalist. Hazlitt also saw a good deal of William Godwin. He was still attempting to get his ‘metaphysical discovery’ into decent order, and it is likely that Godwin advised him. He certainly assisted practically by recommending the work to the publisher Joseph Johnson. The book was published in July 1805. Johnson clearly did not anticipate a huge demand for a work of metaphysics from an unknown author: the first (and only edition in Hazlitt’s lifetime) consisted of just 250 copies, and yet when he was denigrated by the editor of the Quarterly Review, William Gifford, as a writer of third-rate books, Hazlitt responded: ‘For myself, there is no work of mine which I would rate so high, except one, which I dare say you never heard of – An Essay on the Principles of Human Action’ (CW 9: 51).

Mary Lamb, Charles Lamb’s sister, was attempting to interest Hazlitt in a relationship with her friend Sarah Stoddart, who lived in a cottage in Winterslow in Wiltshire. Hazlitt was often busy, so meetings were few and far between. He was working on a second publication, Free Thoughts on Public Affairs (1806). In 1807 he completed his abridgement of The Light of Nature Pursued by Abraham Tucker, and he worked on a series of letters, published in William Cobbett’s Political Register and subsequently as a book entitled A Reply to the Essay on Population, by the Rev. T. R. Malthus (CW 1). Then came his The Eloquence of the British Senate, an anthology of political speeches. Occupied with researching and writing, and still painting, he somehow found time to correspond with Miss Stoddart. She was, at 33, three years older than him. After their largely epistolary courtship, they married on May 1, 1808. The financial interference of Sarah’s brother, John Stoddart, a lawyer and future editor of The Times, rankled with Hazlitt. There were tensions from the start. Sarah liked tidiness and busyness, and despite his recent flurry of publications, she suspected Hazlitt was an idler. In fact, he was working on a book Godwin had commissioned: A New and Improved Grammar of the English Tongue (CW 2). Hazlitt and Sarah went to live in Winterslow. A child was born but lived only a few months. In September 1811, their only child to survive, another William, was born.

Hazlitt worked on a completion of the Memoirs of the Late Thomas Holcroft, which was not published until 1816, in part because Godwin, who had been a close friend of the playwright and novelist, objected to the way Hazlitt had made use of Holcroft’s diary. Earlier, a plan to write a History of English Philosophy had failed due to insufficient subscribers. The scheme was reinvented as a lecture series, with lectures planned on Hobbes, Locke, Berkeley, self-love and benevolence, Helvétius, Price and Priestley on free will and necessity, John Horne Tooke on language, and natural religion. The lectures were delivered at the Russell Institute in Bloomsbury from January 14, 1812. The first lecture was considered monotonous, but subsequently the delivery improved, and Crabb Robinson reported that the final lecture was ‘very well delivered and full of shrewd observation’.  But another attempt to publish the series as a book again failed to attract sufficient subscriptions. Having rejected the ministry, and with only mediocre success as a portrait painter and as a philosopher, Hazlitt was ready for his true vocation: as a journalist, critic, and essayist.

In October 1812 Hazlitt was engaged as a Parliamentary reporter by James Perry, the proprietor of the Morning Chronicle. The four guineas a week he was paid enabled him to move his lodgings to a house in Westminster, one recently vacated by James Mill and owned by Jeremy Bentham, who was also a neighbour (although they may never have met). Within a few months, Hazlitt progressed to an appointment as drama critic, with the opportunity also to contribute political pieces. However, his public support for the fallen Napoleon caused him difficulty with editors. More sympathetic were Leigh Hunt and his brother John Hunt of the Examiner, who were steady in their commitment to political reform. Writing now on drama, painting, and poetry, Hazlitt contributed also to The Edinburgh Review, the leading liberal periodical. Napoleon’s return from Elba in March 1815 and his subsequent defeat at Waterloo represented ‘the utter extinction of human liberty from the earth’. A period of depression and heavy drinking followed. Godwin was one of the few friends who shared his anguish.

Hazlitt’s family situation was difficult. He and Sarah quarrelled, and his brother was now alcoholic and in decline. Hazlitt worked relentlessly to cover household expenses. In 1816 the Memoirs of the Late Thomas Holcroft (CW 3) was finally published, and in 1817 came his first essay collections: The Round Table and Characters of Shakespeare’s Plays (both CW 4). The Round Table shows the mastery of form that Hazlitt had already achieved as an essayist, with 41 titles, including ‘On the Love of Life’, ‘On Mr Kean’s Iago’, ‘On Hogarth’s Marriage a-la-Mode’, ‘On Milton’s Lycidas’, ‘On the Tendency of Sects’, ‘On Patriotism’, ‘On The Character of Rousseau’, ‘Why the Arts are Not Progressive’ and, perhaps most famously, ‘On Gusto’. (There were additional essays by Leigh Hunt in the original edition.)

Hazlitt met John Keats for the first time in 1817: Keats admired him and regarded him as a philosophical mentor. He had also met Percy Shelley, probably at Godwin’s. His relationship with the older Romantics was not good. When John Murray published Coleridge’s long- uncompleted poems ‘Christabel’ and ‘Kubla Khan’, Hazlitt’s reviews displayed the full extent of his frustration with his early mentor. He subsequently criticized Coleridge’s Biographia Literaria vigorously. These attacks upset their mutual friend Charles Lamb and Coleridge himself. Henceforth, in Duncan Wu’s words, Coleridge and Wordsworth ‘dedicated themselves to the dismantling of Hazlitt’s reputation, by fair means or foul’ (Wu, 2008: 191). Hazlitt’s attacks on the poets continued with a review of Robert Southey’s youthful dramatic poem Wat Tyler, which had recently been published against Southey’s wishes. Hazlitt compared its radical sentiments with the poet’s more recent ultra-Royalist articles in the Quarterly Review. But the renegade poets were not the only people he criticized: liberals and reformers were not sacrosanct.

In June 1817, Hazlitt became the drama critic of The Times, which sold 7000 copies a day. The work was exhilarating and exhausting as the two main theatres, Drury Lane and Covent Garden, changed their bills daily, and Hazlitt would often compose the review in his head as he hurried through the streets to dictate it to the printer. In 1818 his reviews were collected in A View of the English Stage. In the same year Lectures on the English Poets was published, based on a lecture series he had given at the Surrey Institution (both CW 5). His lectures had been applauded and cheered, despite some provocative political allusions. The reviews of the books were good, except, inevitably, those in the Tory periodicals. Hazlitt regarded William Gifford, the editor of the Quarterly Review, as ‘the Government’s Critic, the invisible link that connects literature with the police’.

In the summer of 1818 Hazlitt retired to Winterslow to stay by himself at an inn. He wanted to be close to his beloved son, but he was estranged from Sarah. He worked on a new series of lectures, on English comic writers from Ben Jonson to Henry Fielding and Laurence Sterne. By the end of that summer, however, he was rocked by a vituperative article in Blackwood’s Edinburgh Magazine entitled ‘Hazlitt Cross-Questioned’. The author, J. G. Lockhart, the co-editor, had heard from Wordsworth about Hazlitt’s Lake District episode of 1803. The periodical also attacked Keats and Leigh Hunt, ridiculing the three of them as the ‘Cockney School’. It was a scurrilous political campaign, aimed at harming him professionally—and it partly succeeded, for Taylor and Hessey, who had published previous lecture series, withdrew an offer of £20 for the copyright of the Comic Writers series. Hazlitt took legal action and eventually settled out of court, winning £100 damages, plus costs.

Hazlitt now had yearly earnings of approximately £400, some of which he may have gifted to his elderly parents (now living, with his sister Peggy, in Devon). He was not inclined to save money. He was often in default of his rent, and Bentham eventually evicted him. Lectures on the English Comic Writers (CW 6) was published in 1819, followed in August by his Political Essays (CW 7), which included the major two-part essay ‘What is the People’. As usual, the reviews were partisan. William Gifford, in the Quarterly Review, returned to the attack, and the Anti-Jacobin Review called for Hazlitt’s arrest. The attacks, as A. C. Grayling notes (2000: 248), were purely personal. The Government’s repressive measures had raised the political temperature and public discontent. In August eleven people were killed and 600 injured when dragoons charged demonstrators at St Peter’s Field in Manchester.

In November 1819, Hazlitt began a series of lectures on Elizabethan dramatists other than Shakespeare. Lectures on the Dramatic Literature of the Age of Elizabeth was published in February 1820 (CW 6). He was at the height of his reputation, widely recognised as a great critic and prose stylist. In April 1820 he embarked on a series of essays that would further enhance his reputation. These were published as Table Talk, in two volumes in 1821 and 1822 (CW 8). Less polemical than the Round Table essays, they are longer and more reflective. One of the best known of the thirty-three essays is ‘The Indian Jugglers’; others include ‘On Genius and Common Sense’, ‘On the Ignorance of the Learned’, ‘Why Distant Objects Please’, and ‘On the Knowledge of Character’. News of his father’s death had reached Hazlitt belatedly at Winterslow and his feelings about his father are movingly expressed in the essay ‘On the Pleasure of Painting’. After a visit to his mother and sister, he returned to lodgings in London, once again in Southampton Buildings. It was about to become the scene of the most painful episode of his life.

Sarah Walker, the landlady’s daughter, was nineteen. A flirtatious relationship became, on Hazlitt’s side, a passionate infatuation. But Hazlitt was not the only lodger with whom Sarah flirted. When he overheard Sarah and her mother talking lewdly about other lodgers, he was shocked and frustrated. He decided to push Sarah towards a commitment by freeing himself to marry. By February 1822 he was in Scotland, where divorce was easier to obtain, arranging for his wife to discover him with a prostitute. A period of residence in Scotland was required, and he spent the time writing, also lecturing on Shakespeare. His wife’s attitude was pragmatic, and she took the opportunity to walk independently in the Highlands.

News from London concerning Sarah Walker’s behaviour caused Hazlitt additional agony; he rushed to see her only to be met with a cold reception. After a tormented week, he returned to Edinburgh to complete divorce proceedings, then back in London, newly single, he witnessed Sarah Walker walking with his main rival, John Tomkins, in a way that convinced him they were lovers. By now he regarded her as ‘a regular lodging-house decoy’. His friends witnessed the ‘insanity’ of his conflict of adoration and jealousy. Meeting him in the street, Mary Shelley was shocked by his changed appearance. As late as September 1823, visiting London from Winterslow, he spent hours watching Sarah Walker’s door. Hazlitt chose now to compile from his notes and letters a confessional account of the whole affair. This became Liber Amoris, or The New Pygmalion (CW 9), his most notorious book. It was published anonymously in 1823, but no one doubted its authorship. It caused an uproar and allowed his enemies further to impugn his morality and his judgment.

During his period of infatuation, both Keats and Shelley had died. Before his death, Shelley had collaborated with Leigh Hunt and Lord Byron to launch a new journal, The Liberal. One of Hazlitt’s contributions was ‘My First Acquaintance with Poets’, the essay in which he discusses his early meetings with Coleridge and Wordsworth, and which ends with an affectionate tribute to Lamb. If Hazlitt’s literary power was undiminished by those recent events, his financial situation certainly was, and in February 1823 he was arrested for debt. It was an unpleasant experience, but brief because his friends were able to supply ‘terms of accommodation’. He now resumed his regular contributions to periodicals, and he started work on the character portraits that would be republished in The Spirit of the Age (CW 11) in 1825. It sold well and is considered one of his finest achievements. The men portrayed include Bentham, Godwin, Coleridge, Sir Walter Scott, Lord Byron, Southey, Wordsworth, Mackintosh, Malthus, Cobbett, and Lamb.

A relief to his emotional struggles and financial crisis presented itself, conveniently, in the form of marriage to an independent woman, Isabella Bridgewater. She was intelligent and educated, a widow with £300 a year. Their love (or understanding) developed rapidly, and in early 1824 they were in Scotland (where his divorce was recognised) to get married. They then embarked on a continental tour, during which he contributed travel pieces to the Morning Chronicle, subsequently published (in 1826) as Notes of a Journey Through France and Italy (CW 10). In Paris they visited the Louvre. His hopes and commitments had not changed since his last visit in 1802. In Florence he visited Leigh Hunt and Walter Savage Landor. He liked Venice more than Rome but admired the Sistine Chapel. They returned via the Italian Lakes and Geneva, where he enjoyed scenes associated with Jean-Jacques Rousseau.

In 1826 Hazlitt finished preparing for publication the essays collected in his final major collection, The Plain Speaker (CW 12). These included some of his greatest essays, such as ‘On the Prose Style of Poets’, ‘On the Conversation of Authors’, ‘On Reason and Imagination’, ‘On Londoners and Country People’, ‘On Egotism’, ‘On the Reading of Old Books’, ‘On Personal Character’, and, perhaps best known, ‘On the Pleasure of Hating’. The book was published in May 1826, in the same month as Notes of a Journey. Settled in Down Street, Piccadilly, with Isabella, without financial worries, Hazlitt contemplated his most ambitious work: a biography of Napoleon. Researching this would require a prolonged stay in Paris. This, or perhaps young William’s unfriendly manner towards his step-mother, unsettled Isabella, and the marriage foundered. It was said that she had fallen in love with Hazlitt because of his writings and parted from him because of the boy.

By December 1827 Hazlitt was complaining of ill-health. In February 1828 he wrote his ‘Farewell to Essay Writing’, a powerful justification of his ‘unbendingness’: ‘What I have once made up my mind to, I abide by to the end of the chapter’ (CW17: 319). He returned to Paris to pour everything into the completion of The Life of Napoleon Buonaparte (CW 13 – 15). Then, back in London, he continued a project he had started in autumn 1827: a series of ‘conversations’ with James Northcote (1746 – 1831), the artist and former pupil and biographer of Sir Joshua Reynolds. Crabb Robinson reported that there was ‘more shrewdness and originality’ in Northcote and Hazlitt himself than in Dr Johnson and James Boswell. The essays Hazlitt wrote in the last few months of his life showed no signs of decline. One, ‘The Sick Room’, describes his pleasure in reading when ‘bed-rid’: ‘If the stage shows us the masks of men and the pageant of the world, books let us into their souls and lay open to us the secrets of our own. They are the first and last, the most home-felt, the most heart-felt of our enjoyments’ (CW 17: 375 – 76).

Having been often disappointed by the course of European history, Hazlitt survived long enough to hear that the Bourbon monarchy had been overthrown. He wrote in his final essay, ‘On Personal Politics’, that should the monarchy be restored once more, liberty would live on because the hatred of oppression is ‘the unquenchable flame, the worm that dies not’ (CW19: 334n). Hazlitt died on 18 September 1830, most likely from stomach cancer. He was 52. According to his son, his last words were, ‘Well, I’ve had a happy life’. He was buried in the churchyard of St Anne’s, Soho. The funeral was arranged by Charles Lamb, who had been with him when he died.

2. Early Philosophical Works

a. The ‘Metaphysical Discovery’

At the age of sixteen or seventeen Hazlitt made a ‘metaphysical discovery’. It would be another ten years before he could articulate this insight to his satisfaction and work out its wider implications. When the work containing them, An Essay on the Principles of Human Action (CW 1), was finally published in 1805, it was largely ignored. From the late twentieth century on, it has received more attention than ever before. Hazlitt did not pursue a career as a metaphysician, but the ideas remained central to his thinking: he found ways better suited to his genius to infiltrate them into public consciousness.

The ‘metaphysical discovery’ occurred as Hazlitt was reading Baron d’Holbach’s arguments for self-love. He contemplated the possibility that we have a greater tendency to altruism than Hobbes, and most philosophers since, had allowed. Voluntary action concerns future consequences, so questions about egoism and altruism are ultimately about the individual’s relation to his future self. Psychological egoism suggests that even an apparently benevolent action has an underlying selfish motivation, and Hazlitt does not deny that this can be the case, but he wonders what accounts for it. Is the principle of self-love inherent in human nature, or is there a metaphysical case for questioning this dispiriting conclusion?

Hazlitt argues as follows. If I now regret an earlier generous action and, looking back, hold my past self accountable, I am presuming a continuity of personal identity between past and present—and with good reason, for my past self is causally connected to my present self through memory. There is some kind of ‘mechanical’ or psycho-physiological process that connects my past decisions to my present consciousness. But if I now anticipate a future benefit or injury to myself, resulting from a present decision, there can be no comparable connection because the future has not occurred, it does not exist. Therefore, Hazlitt insists, a principle of self-interest cannot apply to my future self: at least, not one that posits an actual continuity or identity of self through time. But is there not some faculty of mind that connects me to it, and is this not as ‘personal’ to me, as exclusive, as memory and consciousness are? These faculties give me access to my past and present experience of a kind that I cannot have to anyone else’s: is not my anticipation of my future experience a directly parallel case?

Hazlitt argues that it is not. There is, currently, no future self. The faculty of mind that anticipates the future self is imagination and, yes, it allows me to anticipate my future, but only in the same way as it allows me to anticipate your future or anyone else’s. We are ‘thrown forwards’ into our futures but not in the intimate, exclusive way in which we connect through memory with our past or through consciousness with our present. The connection I have with my future self, through imagination, has the same degree of disinterestedness or impersonality as my relationship with another person’s future self. An action that might be described as motivated by self-love could equally be described as motivated by disinterested benevolence, for my future self has the metaphysical status of otherness.

This seems counterintuitive. It is true that I can anticipate another person’s pleasure or pain to some extent, but not with the same force or degree of interest as I do my own. Hazlitt knows that we do, as a matter of fact, have a bias towards our own future interests, and that this provides some sense of continuity. However, his supposition is that this bias is acquired: the selfishness that other philosophers argued was inherent is actually the result of nurture, of socialisation. The point is not that benevolence is inherent, but that humans are ‘naturally disinterested’, and therefore we could be educated to think and act differently.

For some commentators this reorientation of the argument concerning egoism and altruism is the Essay’s main point of interest, while for others it is the argument for the discontinuity of personal identity. John Locke had argued in An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (first published in 1689) that what makes someone the same person today as yesterday, or as in their distant childhood, is memory. His ‘Prince and Cobbler’ example, in which the memories of each switch bodies, was intended to show that psychological rather than physical continuity is what guarantees identity through time (Locke, 1975: 340). This was questioned by Thomas Reid in his Essays on the Intellectual Powers (1785). His  ‘General and Ensign’ example suggested that personal identity could not be reduced to psychological continuity (Reid, 1983: 216 – 218). Renewed interest in the question from the 1960s onwards produced a range of fission-based thought experiments that led Derek Parfit, for example, to conclude that it is not personal identity that matters but some degree of psychological survival (Parfit, 1987: 245 – 302). In some scenarios it might not be me who persists, but someone qualitatively very much like me.

Hazlitt appears to have anticipated this distinction. He employs a multiple-fission example to show that the kind of connection we have with our future self cannot guarantee personal identity. What if the connection between past and present were non-causal: could that produce identity? If Person A’s consciousness were replicated (non-causally) in Person B, would A not feel ‘imposed upon’ by a false claim to identity? Anticipating twentieth-century examples involving multiple replicants, such as Parfit’s ‘Mars Tele-Transporter’ example, Hazlitt asks: if a Deity multiplied my self any number of times, would they all be equally myself? Where would my self-interest lie? He concludes: ‘Here then I saw an end to my speculations about absolute self-interest and personal identity’ (CW 12: 47). Hazlitt’s point is that if the concept of personal identity cannot be carried through with logical consistency to a future self which is one and the same as the present self who acts, neither can the idea of the necessity of self-interested action. In any case, although what I am now depends on what I have been, the chain of communication cannot run backwards from the future to the present. If the Deity multiplied me any number of times in the future, or destroyed me, it could not affect my present self.

My only interest in a future self comes from the psychological bias I have acquired from experience, including my upbringing, and if I have thereby acquired a sense of self and a capacity for sympathy with my future self, I have equally acquired a potential for sympathy (empathy) with others. My future self is in fact one of those others with whom I can empathize. Imagination enables me to project out of myself into the feelings of others. Moreover, ‘I could not love myself, if I were not capable of loving others’ (CW1: 2). If this implies that I could not wish good things for my future self if I did not wish good things for the future selves of others, it prompts the question: what motivates the desire for good things to happen to anyone?

Hazlitt’s position suggests an account of child development that sees children as learning in stages to distinguish between self and others and to identify with their own current and anticipated longer-term interests. He knew that people sometimes fail to acquire a moral sense and that they can be driven by circumstances to evil, yet still, he argues, they must have in choosing between alternative actions some notion of good. So, although he rejects the hypothesis that we are naturally self-interested, he admits that there is something which is inherent, that ‘naturally excites desire or aversion’, and this is ‘the very idea of good or evil’. Regardless of what I think makes a future consequence a good one, ‘it cannot be indifferent to me whether I believe that any being will be made happy or miserable in consequence of my actions, whether this be myself or another’ (CW 1: 11 – 12).

It follows from this that both selfish and altruistic actions are in a sense impersonal, for it is the idea of good that motivates, rather than a rational calculation or allocation of benefits. Hazlitt may have had in mind a role for parenting and education in refining and extending the child’s understanding of good. The sensitivity of the faculty of imagination in differentiating degrees of good and evil is improvable. No doubt, in anticipating a future benefit or pleasure, imagination can stimulate an illusion of continuous identity, and the satisfaction one gains from imagining one’s own future pleasure is especially forceful because I know from experience what my future feelings might be, but this does not make the connection with the future self parallel with the connection with one’s past self: it is still a fiction. Imagination provides the freedom to think in a more expansive way, to project one’s love of good beyond self-interest to others one is close to, and beyond to others unknown. It is the freedom to aspire to universal benevolence.

Hazlitt’s disjunction between the self, as constituted by memory and consciousness, and the putative future self appears to have been an original observation. We have seen how Hazlitt has been said (for example, by Martin and Barresi, 1995) to anticipate Parfit on personal identity. A. C. Grayling (2000: 363 – 4) finds a parallel between Peter Strawson’s argument concerning other minds and Hazlitt’s ‘transcendental’ argument that being capable of having an interest in other people’s future is a condition for being capable of having an interest in one’s own. Just as, according to Strawson, one can ascribe states of consciousness to oneself only if one can ascribe them to others, which suggests that observable, bodily behaviours constitute logically adequate criteria for ascribing states of consciousness to others, so, according to Hazlitt, one’s relation to one’s future self has the same status as one’s relation to another person’s future self and this suggests that it must be a condition of acting benevolently towards oneself (self-interestedly) that one can act benevolently towards others.

b. Hartley and Helvétius

The Essay has a second part, Remarks on the Systems of Hartley and Helvétius. David Hartley (1705 – 1757) had presented a physiological and mechanical account of the impact of sensation on the brain. Ideas become associated through repetition, so that one sensation can cause, involuntarily, multiple ideas. For Hazlitt this form of associationism provides an insufficient account of the mind. A physiological chain of vibrations, or the ‘proximity of different impressions’, can no more produce consciousness than ‘by placing a number of persons together in a line we should produce in them an immediate consciousness and perfect knowledge of what was passing in each other’s mind’. Furthermore, the suggestion that different ideas have a definite location in the brain is simply absurd; nor can associationism account for the mingling of different experiences in one idea, as when one hears with joy the song of a thrush and imagines it coming beyond the hill from some warm wood shelter. Every beginning of a series of association must derive from some act of the mind which does not depend on association. Association, where it does exist, is only a particular and accidental effect of some more general principle. Hartley’s account leaves no room for such voluntary mental activity as comparison of one idea with another, for abstraction, reasoning, imagination, judgment—in short, ‘nothing that is essential or honourable to the human mind would be left to it’.

Helvétius (1715 – 1771), Hazlitt’s other disputant in the second part of the Essay, had argued (in De l’esprit, 1758) for a materialist theory of mind and for self-interest as the sole motive of human action, a reduction of right and wrong to pleasure and pain: benevolent actions are an attempt to remove the uneasiness which pity creates in our own minds. Therefore, any disinterestedness hypothesis must be wrong, because only self-gratification provides the required causal mechanism. Hazlitt responds, firstly, that this is irrelevant to the issue. The relation of voluntary action to the future does not differ according to whether the principle impelling it is directed towards the self or towards others. It is no more mechanical in the former case than in the latter. Secondly, there is no reason to resolve feelings of compassion or benevolence into a principle of mechanical self-love. We are necessarily affected emotionally by our actions and their consequences: it would be ‘palpable nonsense’ to suggest that to feel for others we must in reality feel nothing. If all love were self-love, what would be the meaning of ‘self’? It must either point to a distinction in certain cases or be redundant. There must be clear limits to the meaning of the term ‘self-love’; but, in any case, purely as a matter of fact, Hazlitt thinks, it is incorrect to think that we have a mechanical disposition to seek our own good, or to think that, when we act benevolently, an accompanying pleasure sensation necessarily displaces the painful feeling occasioned by another’s distress.

The relevant distress is the other person’s, not my own; it is the relief of his or her distress that I will. To the argument that my love of others amounts to self-love because ‘the impression exciting my sympathy must exist in my mind and so be part of me’, Hazlitt responds that ‘this is using words without affixing any distinct meaning to them’. After all, any object of thought could be described as a part of ourselves: ‘the whole world is contained within us’. If any thought or feeling about or for another person is directed not to them but to me, then by the same token I might sometimes be said to be filled with self-hate: ‘For what is this man whom I think I see before me but an object existing in my mind, and therefore a part of myself?… If I am always necessarily the object of my own thoughts and actions, I must hate, love, serve, or stab myself as it happens’ (CW 1: 89 – 90).

Hazlitt concludes the Essay by affirming the common-sense view that compassion for another person’s injury is not a selfish feeling. When I am wounded, the pain is the effect of ‘physical sensibility’; when I see another person’s wound, my experience of pain is ‘an affair of imagination’. Benevolence ‘has the same necessary foundation in the human mind as the love of ourselves’ (CW 1: 91).

c. History of Philosophy

Hazlitt’s intention to write a history of English philosophy was first heard of in 1809 when an eight-page pamphlet was published advertising ‘Proposals for Publishing, in One Large Quarto… A History of English Philosophy: containing an Account of the Rise and Progress of modern Metaphysics, an Analysis of the Systems of the most celebrated Writers who have treated on the Subject, and an Examination of the principal Arguments by which they are supported. By the Author of An Essay on the Principles of Human Action, and An Abridgement of the Light of Nature Pursued’ (CW 2: 112). By 1810 Hazlitt had decided to turn the History into a series of essays, and in January 1812 these became lectures. After the lecture series had been successfully completed, the Proposals for a History of English Philosophy was republished, with a list of subscribers, but assured sales were too few to cover production costs and the book was never published. Most of the lectures were eventually published as essays in Literary Remains of the Late William Hazlitt in 1836.

The Proposals (entitled Prospectus in Howe’s Complete Works) outlines the positive claims on which Hazlitt’s critique of English philosophy would be based. These include the following: that the mind is not material; that the intellectual powers of the mind are distinct from sensation; that the power of abstraction is a necessary consequence of the limitation of the comprehending power of the mind; that reason is a source of knowledge distinct from, and above, experience; that the principle of association does not account for all our ideas, feelings and actions; that there is a principle of natural benevolence in the human mind; that the love of pleasure or happiness is not the only principle of action, but that there are others implied in the nature of man as an active and intelligent being; that moral obligation is not the strongest motive which could justify any action whatever; that the mind is not mechanical, but a rational and voluntary agent—it is free in as far as it is not the slave of external impressions, physical impulses, or blind senseless motives; and that the idea of power is inseparable from activity—we get it from the exertion of it in ourselves (CW 2: 116 – 119).

The lectures of 1812 included ‘On the Writings of Hobbes’, ‘On Locke’s Essay’, ‘On Self-Love’, and ‘On Liberty and Necessity’. In the first of these he argues that, contrary to popular opinion, Locke was not the founder of ‘the modern system of philosophy’. He sees Locke as a follower of Hobbes. Hazlitt’s argument in these essays takes forward the aim referred to in his Proposals, to oppose ‘the material, or modern, philosophy, as it has been called’, according to which ‘the mind is nothing, and external impressions everything. All thought is to be resolved into sensation, all morality into the love of pleasure, and all action into mechanical impulse’ (CW 2: 113 – 4). This theory, he writes, derives from a false interpretation of Francis Bacon’s use of the word ‘experience’, according to which the term applies to external things only and not to the mind. To apply the experimental methodology of natural philosophy to the mind is to assume an affinity based on ‘no better foundation than an unmeaning and palpable play of words’ (CW 2: 114).

In ‘On Liberty and Necessity’, Hazlitt largely agrees with Hobbes’s account of necessity as implying no more than a connection between cause and effect. Free will is not unmotivated: the motives which cause free actions originate in the mind. ‘The will may be said to be free when it has the power to obey the dictates of the understanding’ (CW 2: 255). Liberty is not an absence of obstruction or an uncertainty, it is ‘the concurrence of certain powers of an agent in the production of that event’. It is as real a thing ‘as the necessity to which it is thus opposed’ (CW 2: 258 – 9).

In the same year as the Proposals first appeared (1809), Hazlitt published A New and Improved Grammar of the English Tongue (CW 2). Hazlitt claims some originality for his theoretical and logical analysis of language. He rejects the assumption that grammatical distinctions and words of different kinds relate to different sorts of things or ideas rather than to our manner of relating to them. The same word can play many roles: what changes is the way things are reordered in relation to one another in our thoughts and discourse. A substantive, for example, is not the name of a substance or quality subsisting by itself but of something considered as subsisting by itself. It is an abstraction. Grammatical distinctions also mark changes in the orientation of the speaker to the hearer (‘the poisonous plant’ vs. ‘the plant is poisonous’). Verbs, like adjectives, express attributes and direct the hearer either to a familiar connection between things or to a new or unknown one. Verbs are not the only words that express ideas of being, doing, or suffering, but they have a certain eminence in that, without them, we cannot affirm or deny, ask for information or communicate a desire, express or understand an idea. Hazlitt appears to have grasped something of the pragmatics, in addition to the syntactical and semantic features, of language and communication.

Hazlitt acknowledged the importance and influence of John Horne Tooke’s The Diversions of Purley (1786), which had provided a general theory of language and the mind, but he disagreed with Tooke’s ideas concerning abstractions. He returned to this in ‘On Abstract Ideas’ and ‘On Tooke’s Diversions of Purley’, two of the lectures delivered in 1812. Tooke agrees with Hobbes, Hume, Berkeley, and others that there are no abstract or complex ideas. Hazlitt counters that, on the contrary, ‘we have no others’, for if all ideas were simple and individual we could not have an idea even of such things as a chair, a blade of grass, a grain of sand, each of which is a ‘certain configuration’ or assemblage of different things or qualities. Every idea of a simple object is ‘an imperfect and general notion of an aggregate’ (CW 2: 191). ‘Without the cementing power of the mind, all our ideas would be necessarily decomposed… We could indeed never carry on a chain of reasoning on any subject, for the very links of which this chain must consist, would be ground to powder’ (CW 2: 280).

Hazlitt alludes to an idea that was to stay central to his philosophical outlook: ‘The mind alone is formative, to borrow the expression of a celebrated German writer’ (CW 2: 280). How much did Hazlitt know of Immanuel Kant’s philosophy and to what extent was he an idealist? One reason for asking this is that the debate concerning politics and epistemology, brought to the fore by the empiricism of Burke’s Reflections on the Revolution in France (1790), enticed Romantic writers to explore, as Timothy Michael puts it, ‘the idea… that it is through rational activity that things like liberty and justice cease to be merely ideas’ (Michael, 2016: 1). Hazlitt was one writer who went some way towards idealism. It promised a potential alternative to Godwin’s utopianism, to Bentham’s felicific calculus, and to Burke’s arguments from experience and tradition.

d. Kant and Idealism

 Hazlitt’s opinion that particulars are abstract ideas constructed by an abstract entity we call ‘the mind’ suggests that he had absorbed at least some of the ideas of idealism. He is opposed to any materialist epistemology that has no place for the active power of the mind, but he does not agree with Berkeley that there is no mind-independent world. We can, to an extent, experience an external reality but we cannot conceptualize, know, or understand it without the mind’s faculty of abstraction.

‘Abstraction,’ Hazlitt writes, ‘is a trick to supply the defect of comprehension’. This sentence occurs in the Preface to his 1807 abridgement of Abraham Tucker’s The Light of Nature Pursued. He goes on to argue that abstraction is only half of the understanding: common sense is also needed, and he sees Tucker’s ‘sound, practical, comprehensive good sense’ as the great merit of his (too-voluminous) work (CW 1: 125). There are only two sorts of philosophy: one ‘rests chiefly on the general notions and conscious perceptions of mankind, and endeavours to discover what the mind is, by looking into the mind itself; the other denies the existence of everything in the mind, of which it cannot find some rubbishly archetype, and visible image in its crucibles and furnaces, or in the distinct forms of verbal analysis’. The latter can be left to chemists and logicians, the former is ‘the only philosophy fit for men of sense’.

Hazlitt himself connects Tucker’s philosophy with Kant’s. Tucker ‘believed with professor Kant in the unity of consciousness, or “that the mind alone is formative,” that fundamental article of the transcendental creed’. It is not clear when Hazlitt first became acquainted with Kant’s philosophy. Before he had finished preparing the arguments of the Essay for publication, in 1805, he may have encountered Friedrich August Nitsch’s A General and Introductory View of Professor Kant’s Principles concerning Man, the World and the Deity, submitted to the Consideration of the Learned (1796) or John Richardson’s Principles of Critical Philosophy, selected from the works of Emmanuel Kant and expounded by J. S. Beck (1797) or the same writer’s later publications, but it is most likely that he had encountered Anthony Willich’s Elements of the Critical Philosophy (1798). We know that Coleridge possessed a copy of Willich’s Elements, and he may well have discussed Kant’s philosophy directly with Hazlitt, or with a mutual acquaintance such as Godwin or Crabb Robinson. By 1807, possibly by 1805, Hazlitt certainly knew something of Kant and appreciated him as a formidable opponent of ‘the empirical or mechanical philosophy’ and as a proponent of the doctrine of the creative and active power of the mind.

Hazlitt had definitely seen Willich’s translation by 1814. In his review of Madame de Staël’s Account of German Philosophy and Literature, he mentions Willich’s summary of the Critique of Pure Reason as including the proposition that ‘We are in possession of certain notions a priori which are absolutely independent of all experience, although the elements of experience correspond with them, and which are distinguished by necessity and strict universality’ (CW 20: 18). A footnote takes issue with this idea: ‘This, if the translation is correct… is, as it appears to me, the great stumbling block in Kant’s Philosophy. It is quite enough to shew, not that there are certain notions a priori or independent of sensation, but certain faculties independent of the senses or sensible objects, which are the intellect itself, and necessary, after the objects are given, to form ideas of them’. Having rejected Locke’s doctrine of the mind as a blank slate, Hazlitt was not keen to fill it with what he saw as innate ideas. Whether he or Willich is to blame for the misreading, it seems that, even in 1814, Hazlitt’s understanding of Kant’s philosophy was incomplete.

Did he appreciate Kant’s moral philosophy? There is, perhaps, some similarity between the categorical imperative and the role the mind plays in Hazlitt’s account of disinterested voluntary action. Certainly, for Hazlitt moral action is dissociated from a calculation of material advantage. It is not utilitarian or teleological, but neither is it exactly deontological in the sense of being based on universal rules or duties. There are parallels with Kant’s notion of a priori understanding in that moral action is conformity to a moral standard that is not derived from sensory experience, but for Hazlitt sensory experience is not all experience. Moral action is free of self-interest, but it is not free of selfhood, of the passions and habits and dispositions of the individual self. Hazlitt’s faculty of imagination lacks the purity of Kant’s idea of reason. Its recognition of good is based on experience and past preferences, so the active nature of the individual mind does not entail that reasonable choices converge.

3. Political Thought

a. Early Political Writing

One of the intellectual virtues that Hazlitt championed as a critic and essayist was openness, in the sense both of open-mindedness and of candour. This does not mean that he was flexible in his core political commitments. On the contrary, he valued a principled steadiness. True to his Dissenting roots, he was unshakeable in his commitment to civil and religious liberty and in his opposition to Toryism, the war with France, and the restoration of the Bourbon monarchy. Like many of his generation, he admired Godwin’s Enquiry Concerning Political Justice, but not uncritically, and if he espoused the politics of radical reform, he did so with a degree of skepticism concerning the modifiability of human nature. His open-mindedness and candour meant that he was prepared to criticize, and to antagonize, people who shared his commitments, and to praise those with whom he disagreed politically.

After the Essay was published, Hazlitt was quick to apply its fundamental insights to politics. In his 1806 pamphlet Free Thoughts on Public Affairs (CW 1), he denounces the ‘false patriotism’ of Tory policies, seeing it as a cover for militaristic nationalism, imperialism, and the erosion of constitutional rights. He blames the recently deceased William Pitt the Younger for diffusing ‘a spirit of passive obedience and non-resistance’ (CW 1: 112). He does not reject, as Godwin had done, the legitimacy of the state as an institution, but he insists that a radically reformed state and senate should reject selfish attachments in favour of disinterested policies that bring universal benefit. In this early statement of his political commitments, the ‘metaphysical discovery’ underpins his opposition to tyranny, capitalism, and imperialism.

In The Eloquence of the British Senate (CW 1), an anthology of political speeches (with commentary), published in 1807, Hazlitt makes clear his commitment to the British people’s right and constitutional duty ‘to resist the insidious encroachments of monarchical power’. He condemns the political corruption rampant in the parliamentary system and praises (pre-1789) Edmund Burke and Charles James Fox for their disinterested patriotism and benevolence. In the same year he composed five letters addressed to Thomas Malthus, three of which were published in William Cobbett’s Political Register. Malthus had originally written An Essay on the Principle of Population (1798) in response to Nicolas de Condorcet’s and Godwin’s optimism about the consequences of social improvement. Malthus’s argument that population growth would inevitably outstrip the potential for subsistence was proving influential even in Whig circles. Godwin’s major response would not be published until 1820; meanwhile, Hazlitt’s letters were a significant contribution to the defence of social progress and justice. Hazlitt condemns Malthus’s fatalism and advocacy of the principle of self-love. He also opposed Samuel Whitbread’s Malthusian Poor Bill, which proposed a national system of parochial schools, which, in Hazlitt’s view, would indoctrinate and further increase the vassalage of the poor. Like Godwin, he saw any such state-sponsored system as undermining independence of thought and the principle of popular democracy.

b. Virtue and Liberty

As Hazlitt’s career as a journalist, critic, and essayist developed, he focused on the particular and the individual rather than on abstract principles, but his opposition to the unjust exercise of power was clear and consistent. His Preface to Political Essays (1819) emphasizes his commitment to autonomy, to candour, to opposing selfishness and corruption. He writes:

I am no politician, and still less can I be said to be a party-man: but I have a hatred for tyranny, and a contempt for its tools… I have no mind to have my person made a property of, nor my understanding made a dupe of. I deny that liberty and slavery are convertible terms, that right and wrong, truth and falsehood, plenty and famine, the comforts or wretchedness of a people, are matters of perfect indifference. (CW 7: 7)

Openness, integrity, and sincerity are the virtues Hazlitt opposes to the temptations of advancement through corruption or the allure of power. ‘The admiration of power in others,’ he writes, ‘is as common to man as the love of it in himself: the one makes him a tyrant, the other a slave’ (CW 7: 148). The willingness of a people to become the instruments of tyrants and oppressors allows power to claim legitimacy. It does not speak well for human nature if it can be seduced in this way. Once embedded in people’s minds, power is almost irremovable. This hatred of unjust power explains Hazlitt’s opposition to hereditary monarchy and the idea of divine right; and it explains also, and more controversially, his admiration for Napoleon, whom he came to see as the final bastion against the threat to liberty represented by European monarchies.

Though not a ‘party-man’, Hazlitt thinks like a modern politician when he concedes the need to make pragmatic and partisan concessions in the cause of liberty:

If we were engaged in a friendly contest, where integrity and fair dealing were the order of the day, our means might be as unimpeachable as our ends; but in a struggle with the passions, interests, and prejudices of men, right reason, pure intention, are hardly competent to carry through: we want another stimulus. The vices must be opposed to each other sometimes with advantage and propriety. (CW 17: 40)

Integrity sometimes permits one to speak truth to power in language that power understands.

Freedom of will and political freedom are linked in Hazlitt’s conception of the mind’s innate power, subject only to the laws of its own innate constitution, and arbitrary political power which tries to make us passive machines. Both kinds of power may be tyrannical, and we are too inclined to admire political power in others. Uttara Natarajan observes that in his conversational essays we see Hazlitt attempting to translate into practice the ideal of the innate power of the individual resisting arbitrary political power (1998: 116). Potentially the most powerful instrument in the cause of liberty, poetry is neutral, and the power of language can be put to use on either side. In a sense liberty and political power are unevenly matched, for the former is diffused and the latter concentrated, and liberty must contend also with ego, pride, and prejudice. As with the will of individuals, it is not inevitable that the will of the people will be directed to the common good, but at least it has the capacity to be so directed.

That provides at least a degree of hope; yet Hazlitt sometimes comes close to despair about the prospects for genuine change. In one of his many aphorisms, he states:

If reform were to gain the day, reform would become as vulgar as cant of any other kind. We only shew a spirit of independence and resistance to power, as long as power is against us. As soon as the cause of opposition prevails, its essence and character are gone out of it; and the most flagrant radicalism degenerates into the tamest servility. (CW 20: 333)

Nevertheless, it was important to sustain resistance, to exert freedom of the will, in order to retain whatever liberty remained.

c. The People

Like Winston Smith in George Orwell’s Nineteen Eighty-Four, Hazlitt looks to the proletariat. In essays depicting country people and townspeople, he characterizes both with frankness. A Cockney is someone who ‘sees and hears a vast number of things, and knows nothing’ (CW 12:  66). By his lack of servility, ‘Your true Cockney is your only true leveller’ (CW12: 67). Whereas the county dweller is petty and parochial, the urban dweller benefits from his exposure to the mass of people. London is described as ‘a visible body-politic, a type and image of that great Leviathan’. The urban social experience is an emancipation from ‘petty interests and personal dependence’.

Hazlitt recognises that although differences of character, talent, and discrimination mean there is undeniable superiority in particular spheres of life, including art, poetry, and criticism, nevertheless, superiority ‘arises out of the presupposed ground of equality’ (CW 8: 208). The benefit that ordinary people gain from society, from ‘free communication and comparing of ideas’, is denied to people of rank, ‘where all is submission on one side, and condescension on the other’. He is astonished by the airs and graces some people give themselves when there is so ‘little difference… in mankind (either in body or mind)’. Individual achievement is grounded in the essential equality of the people: ‘I am proud up to the point of equality—every thing above or below that appears to me arrant impertinence or abject meanness’ (CW 20: 123). Differences are largely due to disparities of opportunity and esteem.

In two powerful essays entitled ‘What is the People?’ (CW 7), Hazlitt attacks efforts by Southey and others to associate parliamentary reform with insurrection. The Poet Laureate criticizes the maxim vox populi vox Dei—the voice of the people is the voice of God. Hazlitt’s answer to the question What is the people? is:

Millions of men, like you, with hearts beating in their bosoms, with thoughts stirring in their minds, with blood circulating in their veins, with wants and appetites, and passions and anxious cares, and busy purposes and affections for others and a respect for themselves, and a desire for happiness, and a right to freedom, and a will to be free’. (CW 7: 259)

He launches into a ferocious attack on his antagonist, who would lay the mighty heart of the nation ‘bare and bleeding at the foot of despotism’, who would ‘make the throne every thing, and the people nothing’ and be himself a ‘cringing sycophant, a court favourite, a pander to Legitimacy.

This notion, legitimacy, is nothing other than the old doctrine of Divine Right ‘new-vamped’. The purpose of the Government should be to benefit the governed; its interests should not be at variance with those of the people, which are common and equal rights, yet the Government, Hazlitt thinks, sees its interest as preserving its privileges and those of the great and powerful. The dog kennels of the great and powerful are ‘glutted with the food which would maintain the children of the poor’. The people obstruct their absolute power; therefore rulers will always try to root out ‘the germs of every popular right and liberal principle’. How can rulers such as these be expected to have sympathy with those whose loss of liberty is their gain? The wealth of the few is composed of ‘the tears, the sweat, and blood of millions’ (CW 7: 264 – 5).

If a corrupt, self-interested Government cannot be trusted to serve the people’s interest, what can? There is no better solution, Hazlitt insists, than a popular democracy: ‘Vox populi vox Dei is the rule of all good Government: for in that voice, truly collected and freely expressed… we have all the sincerity and all the wisdom of the community’. In fact, the closer we can get to a direct democracy, in which each individual’s consciousness of his or her own needs and desires is registered, the better. In the opposite extreme (hereditary despotism), the people are ‘an inert, torpid mass, without the power, scarcely with the will, to make its wants or wishes known’ (CW 7: 268).

Hazlitt does not appear to endorse Godwin’s anarchistic localism, for he thinks representation and universal suffrage is the closest to direct democracy that can be achieved, but there are Godwinian themes when he addresses, in the second part of the essay, the question ‘Where are we to find the intellect of the people?’. His answer is everywhere. Public opinion incorporates ‘all those minds that have ever devoted themselves to the love of truth and the good of mankind’ (CW 7: 269). Lord Bacon was a great man, but not because he was a lord; Burke received his pension from the King, but not his understanding or his eloquence. What have hereditary monarchs ever done for the people? What wisdom is there in the Established Church, in the slave trade, in error, inhumanity, corruption and intolerance, in Church-and-King mobs but not in petitions for parliamentary reform? According to Hazlitt,

‘Loyalty, patriotism, and religion, are regarded as the natural virtues and plain unerring instincts of the common people: the mixture of ignorance or prejudice is never objected to in these: it is only their love of liberty or hatred of oppression that are discovered… to be the proofs of a base and vulgar disposition. (CW 7: 271)

Vox populi is the voice of God because it is the cry raised against ‘intolerable oppression and the utmost extremity of human suffering’ (CW 7: 278). Freed from attempts to stifle it or give it a false bias, it must lead ‘to the gradual discovery and diffusion of knowledge in this as in all other departments of human knowledge’. Indoctrinated by the Church and State, the people have been denied a proper (non-catechistic) education, and therefore the opportunity to ‘take the management of our own affairs into our own hands, or to seek our fortunes in the world ourselves’. Liberty requires the people to want it more than they want power, and to recognise their oppression. He shares with Godwin the view that individual judgment will improve when people are allowed to exercise it.

To develop his attack on the hereditary principle, Hazlitt invents a fable or thought experiment. He supposes that the actor Edmund Kean takes out letters patent ‘to empower him and his heirs for ever… by the grace of God and the favour of the Prince Regent’  to take the lead in all future stage tragedies, regardless of actual talent, and despite the fact that his son is ‘a little crook-kneed, raven-voiced, disagreeable, mischievous, stupid urchin, with the faults of his father’s acting, and none of his fine qualities’ (CW 7: 274). Unless forced to attend at the point of a bayonet, the public would simply stay away. ‘Surely, if government were a thing requiring the utmost genius, wisdom, virtue, to carry it on, the office of King would never even have been dreamt of as hereditary, any more than that of poet, painter, or philosopher’ (CW 7: 274). Near idiots are supposed capable of ruling while the people are denigrated as ‘a swinish multitude’ and mocked for their lack of refinement and philosophy. When will the ‘long minority’ of the people expire? Despotic rulers, tenacious of power, should indeed fear the people’s fury, even if timely reform might prevent, or delay, a revolution.

‘What is the People?’ is Hazlitt at his most polemical. The pronouns ‘we’ and ‘our’ become prominent as he aligns himself with the people. His tendency to skepticism about enduring progress is suppressed in favour of a defiant tone that conveys the tensions in the period before the Peterloo Massacre of 1819. It is in stark contrast to the aloof voice of An Essay on the Principles of Human Action, though the militant is identical with the metaphysician.

d. The Press and Freedom of Speech

The idea of a disinterested state of mind, first developed in the Essay, grounds Hazlitt’s political thinking and, specifically, his commitment to freedom of speech and the liberty of the press. The faculties of mind, including imagination, are active and receptive, and they develop through exposure to ideas and beliefs that are encountered through conversation and, especially, through reading. We are naturally disposed to sympathize with the feelings of others, but our faculties need cultivation. We need to be challenged and to exercise judgment in the careful consideration of different points of view, and without prioritising our own interests or settled opinions.

The invention of printed books made knowledge more widely available, and the press is, potentially at least, ‘the great organ of intellectual improvement and civilisation’ (CW 13: 34). Hazlitt was, of course, aware that periodicals could equally be organs of Government propaganda. Editors, booksellers, and publishers were prosecuted under the Sedition and Libel acts more often than authors themselves. For example, in 1798 Joseph Johnson, the publisher of the Essay, and of Hazlitt’s father’s sermons, of Priestley, Wollstonecraft, Godwin and others, was tried and imprisoned for sedition. John Hunt, Hazlitt’s friend and the publisher of The Examiner and The Yellow Dwarf, was twice imprisoned. William Cobbett fled to the United States to avoid arrest. Hazlitt is often at his most splenetic (and least disinterested, perhaps) in considering the editors of the Tory press and their turncoat contributors. In the former category is William Gifford, the editor of the Quarterly Review. Hazlitt describes him as being so well qualified for the situation ‘by a happy combination of defects, natural and acquired’ that at his death ‘it will be difficult to provide him a suitable successor’ (CW 11: 114).  Mercilessly denouncing Whigs and Radicals as ‘dunces and miscreants’, Gifford ‘entitles himself to the protection of the Church and State’ (CW 11: 117). People like this ‘poison the sources of public opinion’ (CW 11: 124). A puppet press manipulates public opinion, diverting it from truth, justice, and liberty. Without the opportunity to develop independent thinking, individuals cannot break free from prejudice and received opinion.

The discontinuity of personal identity is alluded to, ironically, in Hazlitt’s response to Southey’s attempt to suppress the unauthorised publication, in 1817, of his youthful dramatic poem Wat Tyler, which the Poet Laureate now regarded as seditious. The former Radical had become a strong opponent of parliamentary reform and of free speech. What could prompt such a turnaround? Hazlitt imputes it ‘rather to a defect of moral principle than to an accession of intellectual strength’ (CW 7: 180). Hazlitt had admired the Lake poets’ earlier work, but he insists on his right to criticize them in print. Integrity requires Hazlitt to speak truth, also, to those allies he feels sometimes undermine the cause: Godwin was too utopian, Percy Shelley too extreme, Robert Owen disingenuous in claiming originality. The underlying idea is still disinterestedness: a critical, candid, disinterested response to the spirit of the age, to the cacophony of its leading voices. What would be the point of independent, disinterested judgment if, from tact or pusillanimity, one preferred self-censorship to candid free speech? Freedom is the right to criticize and disagree.

4. The Essayist as Philosopher

a. Late Twentieth and Early Twenty-First Century Studies

Interest in Hazlitt, and especially in his philosophy, was largely dormant throughout Victorian times and most of the twentieth century. Herschel Baker (1962) and W. P.  Albrecht (1965) both comment on the philosophy, in Baker’s case none too favourably, but it is since Roy Park’s 1971 study that interest has been sustained. Several biographies and critical studies have appeared that have attempted to do justice to Hazlitt the philosopher and political thinker, as well as to Hazlitt the critic and conversational essayist. These include biographies by A. C. Grayling (2000) and Duncan Wu (2008). Stanley Jones (1989) focuses on Hazlitt’s later life. David Bromwich’s intellectual biography The Mind of the Critic (1983) is recognised as a major critical study of Hazlitt as a leading figure of Romanticism. John Kinnaird (1978) traces Hazlitt’s use of the term ‘power’ in both political and creative contexts. Tom Paulin (1998) emphasizes Hazlitt’s genius as a prose stylist and radical thinker. Stephen Burley (2014) places Hazlitt’s life and thought in the context of his Unitarian upbringing and education and focusses on his early philosophical work. Kevin Gilmartin (2015) puts politics at the centre of Hazlitt’s achievement as a critic and essayist. A major collection of essays by several authors, Metaphysical Hazlitt: Bicentenary Essays (2005) marked the bicentenary of Hazlitt’s Essay on the Principles of Human Action and explored its relevance to his other work.

These works testify to the modern interest in Hazlitt’s overall achievement. But it is worth taking a closer look at two distinctive interpretations of the philosophy, focused on different key concepts, in order to relate them to his work as a critic and essayist. Park’s Hazlitt and the Spirit of the Age (1971) focuses on what he sees as Hazlitt’s entirely original theory of abstract ideas; Uttara Natarajan’s Hazlitt and the Reach of Sense: Criticism, Morals, and the Metaphysics of Power (1998) focuses on Hazlitt’s insistence on the formative power of the mind. Both books investigate how Hazlitt’s philosophical commitments were integral to the style and content of the literary essays on which his reputation as a writer rests.

b. Abstraction and the Poetic

Roy Park argues that Hazlitt’s theory of abstraction explains the role that both painting and philosophy played in the formulation of his literary theory. He emphasizes how Hazlitt disguises the philosophy in his essays by focusing the reader’s attention on the concrete and particular. He sees partial parallels with the thought of Coleridge, Thomas Carlyle, and Mathew Arnold in the way Hazlitt represents abstraction as a threat to our experience of the poetic—which is to say, to civilized living. Literature is a response to life at its deepest level, to life experienced imaginatively rather than rationally. Contemporary philosophers, such as Bentham, Condorcet, even Godwin, represent humankind in materialistic terms. ‘Experience’ should not be restricted to material or physiological experience. The moral theories of egotism and utilitarianism, which make pleasure and pain the only criteria of right action, also Malthus’s theory of population, are the outcome of empirical epistemology. Park sees Hazlitt as attempting (like Thomas Reid) to harmonize the ‘material’ with the ‘intellectual’ or ‘imaginative’, and (like Francis Bacon) the abstract with the concrete, the individual with the universal, the scientific with the spiritual (1971: 20 – 21).

Hazlitt was not interested, Park writes, in converting the poetic into something other than itself. To ask What is the poetic? is an improper question, for the essence of poetry and life are lost when we attempt to explain them. It is not so much that thought is mysterious as that mystery is part of the thought. Hazlitt’s experiential response to the poetic and the existential was appreciated by Percy Shelley and John Keats: ‘Hazlitt initiated the response… but it is to Keats that we owe the classic formulation of the experiential standpoint in his characterization of negative capability as a condition in which “man is capable of being in uncertainties”’ (Park, 1971: 32).

Park sees Hazlitt’s objection to abstraction as being an objection ‘to all closed systems of thought in which the whole of human experience was interpreted in the light of the system’s initial premiss, empirical or metaphysical, with scant regard to the individuality, complexity and diversity of “the truth of things”’ (1971: 35). He quotes Hazlitt’s observation in the Lectures on English Philosophy:

‘They [system-makers] have in fact always a purpose… [which] takes away the tremulous sensibility to every slight and wandering impression which is necessary to complete the fine balance of the mind, and enable[s] us to follow all the infinite fluctuations of thought through their nicest distinctions. (CW 2: 269; Park, 1971: 37)

One of Hazlitt’s objections to Wordsworth’s ‘The Excursion’ is that it has ‘palpable designs upon us’.

Hazlitt’s Essay prepared the way for his rejection of abstraction by its rejection of mechanical associationism and of psychological egoism, and by its discovery of natural disinterestedness and the active power of the mind. Park thinks Hazlitt’s analysis of personal identity is not as significant as the argument against psychological egoism or the positioning of the imagination—the faculty of self-transcendence—as the moral faculty. It is the prerequisite for the openness characteristic of the existential stance. Furthermore, Park argues, it parallels Kant’s autonomously legislative will: practical reason and imagination are both essentially experiential.

But imagination’s role is not just as a mode of volitional consciousness: it is also the faculty of the poetic (1971: 49). Hazlitt connects imagination with the vital role played by sentiments in developing our habits and affections. The existential or sentimental relationship with the world around us is what Hazlitt calls ‘the poetry of life’—what makes life worth living. Imagination extends beyond volitional consciousness to include art and life in general. We are poetical animals because we love, hope, fear, hate, despair, wonder, admire. For Hazlitt, the spirit of poetry and the spirit of humanity are the same. The past becomes a fable, investing objects with value; objects become epiphanies. Childhood is important for its ‘symbolic fecundity and its subsequent symbolic richness’ (Park, 1971: 66). Poetry expresses this revelation of the significance of human life, modifying and enlivening the mystery of existence, the real and interior spirit of things. Value is quality, not, as in Bentham’s utilitarianism, quantity. The fine arts and poetry are self-authenticating; their value is never instrumental: ‘they toil not, neither do they spin’ (CW 18: 167). But that is not to say that they have no cultural implications for the individual or for society. Through literature and the arts, we are humanized: they enable us to become aware of our inter-relatedness with the rest of humanity.

Intellectual progress is not towards abstraction, as Locke and later philosophers had thought, but towards individuation. Objects of sense are complex; they are ‘seen’ with our understanding and our hearts: the more we observe, the more we see. Hazlitt, Park observes, had learned this as a painter. Detail is the essence of the poetic. Hazlitt’s critical vocabulary is full of terms derived from painting, terms related to the kind of ‘gusto’ appropriate to that branch of literature, and terms connected with particularity and individuation: ‘detail’, ‘distinction’, ‘tint’, ‘local’, ‘concrete’, ‘subtle’, and the contrasting terms such as ‘abstract’, ‘vague’, ‘universal’, ‘indefinite’, ‘theoretical’. It is out of particularity that the universal emerges. It is the precise and the vague that are in opposition, not the individual and the general. Park observes that Hazlitt’s attitude to abstraction helps us to understand his own view of his work as ‘the thoughts of a metaphysician expressed by a painter’.

Hazlitt’s use of this term ‘gusto’ epitomises his experiential view of the poetic. Derived from art criticism, it refers to the particular character of a work of art or literature: the quality which, as it were, differentiates one grain of sand from another. What the work expresses, in all its complexity, can only be expressed in the work itself. Our job is to submit to the artist’s or poet’s vision. In an essay that itself exemplifies gusto, ‘The Indian Juggler’, Hazlitt refers to the poet’s ability to unravel ‘the mysterious web of thought and feeling’ through ‘the power of that trembling sensitivity which is awake to every change and every modification of its every-varying impressions’ (CW 8: 83).

Philosophers are too connected to their form of abstraction. Park quotes Ludwig Wittgenstein (1958: 18) on the ‘craving for generality’ and the tendency of philosophers to try to answer questions in the way that scientists do (Park, 1971: 210). Feeling is the most important factor in Hazlitt’s distrust of abstraction. Imagination is the power of carrying feeling into other situations, including into other people’s situations. Park uses the term ‘imaginative sincerity of feeling’ to refer to the power of imagination at work in art and in moral action. This and gusto and the distrust of abstraction are all facets, Park insists, of Hazlitt’s experiential view of the poetic: they give a unity to his criticism (1971: 169). The combination and balance between these facets serve to isolate the peculiar, original, and characteristic nature of a work in relation to the artist’s individual genius, and to discriminate kinds and degrees of poetic excellence.

Park argues that for Hazlitt hope lies in the nature of poetry itself and in the spirit of man. His disappointment with his own age is demonstrated in The Spirit of the Age (CW 11), published in 1825, a work Park describes as ‘a masterpiece of indirectness’, an ‘aggregate of well-founded particulars’ (1971: 213 – 214). It is like an historical painting of the age, starting with portraits of Bentham, Godwin, and Coleridge, and proceeding with writers and politicians that exemplify aspects of the times or who, like Coleridge, had capitulated to the spirit of the age. Abstraction is to blame for its political and aesthetic limitations: the principle of utility, for example, is characteristic.

c. Power and the Poetic

Uttara Natarajan thinks the attention given by Park to Hazlitt’s criticism of abstraction is ‘at the expense of the larger theoretical framework of his writing’ (Natarajan,1998: 6). She calls for the recognition of Hazlitt as not only a great critic but also as a profound philosopher. Hazlitt’s criticism of art and literature, and his political and social criticism, is pervaded by the epistemology and metaphysics of the Essay, and also by its moral theory. Her main claim is that all Hazlitt’s subsequent thought follows from what she sees as the central idea of the Essay: the concept of power. Power is the independence of the mind from manipulation by the senses (or, equivalently, by external objects). The concept of power ‘is at the very core of Hazlitt’s celebration of all intellectual activity as the vindication of an innate self-directing principle with which the mind is endowed (Natarajan,1998: 27).

The formative power of the mind is evidenced by the structure of language, and poetic language especially has a reach that extends beyond the mind to objective reality. In Natarajan’s view, therefore, Hazlitt’s linguistic philosophy is more important than has previously been recognised. Language is the means by which we can understand the self. Words affirm, Natarajan writes, ‘the relation between mind and nature: the moral goal, unity’ (1998: 146). Unity is always a function of the self-projecting attribute of the mind and its ability to create relations and perceive wholes. Language is not a limitation but a manifestation of the mind’s power.

Whereas ordinary language does not reveal externally ‘subsisting objects’, poetic or ‘inspired’ language is true to nature when it conveys the impression the object makes on the mind. Its role is to evoke things as they are felt by the speaker, their emotional significance. Hazlitt’s term ‘impression’, Natarajan observes, is imbued with the weight of feeling. The prime mover is not the object itself but the imagination: it is constructive, it assembles the whole. The power of human perception is embodied in the ‘excess of the imagination beyond the actual or ordinary impression of any object or feeling’ (1998: 27). Hazlitt ‘grants to the purely intellectual a degree of actuality equal to, if not greater than, the impressions of the sense’ (1998: 39). It is through the apprehension of imagination that, in Wordsworth’s words, we ‘see into the life of things’.

Natarajan reminds us that Hazlitt had been educated in Unitarianism, in which God is the power that unifies the order of creation. In Hazlitt’s work, the human intellectual faculty replaces the divine. ‘Nature’ and ‘truth’ are imagination embodied in words. Imagination brings about a process of association, whereby it projects itself into the order of nature to produce its own immaterial creation, its own unity. This active form of associationism opposes the mechanical, materialist, passive, and deterministic associationism of Hartley and Priestley. We never see the whole of an object by looking at it: we ‘read’ it with an associative power that allows it endlessly to accrue meaning. The mind is no blank slate; rather, nature is the blank that gains meaning from the mind. It grows with its growth. Looking into nature is looking into oneself, and vice-versa.

Hazlitt adopts a pluralistic view of truth: it ‘is not one but many; and an observation may be true in itself that contradicts another equally true, according to the point of view from which we contemplate the subject’ (CW 9: 228). Truth is an aggregation, a universal composed of particulars, a union of the abstract and the concrete, synthesized by the imagination. A point of view is true when it is authentic and produced, as in poetry and art, from well-founded particulars. Poetic truth is individualistic, an original insight made possible by the poet’s experience and circumstance and influenced by innate biases or predispositions. This suggests a paradox of determinism simultaneous with free volition. The agent’s dispositions influence choices, but the idea of freedom of the will refers to the choice between motives, which is an inner activity, not externally directed. So, although an agent, artist, or poet is inevitably constrained by the constitution of his or her own mind, it is precisely this that creates the individuality to which she or he must be true. Imaginative truth is an exclusive original insight: truth but not the truth. The artistic genius is compelled to communicate this truth to us, almost tyrannically, in a kind of ‘transfusion of mind’, and yet this is also a sublimation of self.

Hazlitt’s idea of the empowered mind, Natrajan observes, is where his linguistics, epistemology, and poetics converge. It provides, too, a model of the self ‘at once the origin and the product of power’ (Natarajan, 1998: 78). Self-love and benevolence are identically manifestations of innate imagination. By refuting the mechanistic and passive notion of the self, Hazlitt is able to emphasize the capacity of the mind to apprehend holistically both self and others. ‘Alterity’, Natarajan writes, ‘validates the moral nature of man… If that which is other to the self can be shown to constitute a real motive to action, then the self owns moral agency (1998: 121). However, there is a love of power in the mind independent of the love of good. Hazlitt emphasizes this especially in The Plain Speaker essays (CW 12), where empowered mind is shown as bigoted and exclusive. To reach a just determination, we must set aside the bias of the will, the mind’s dispositions. This reconciliation of wisdom and power is achievable because the self is the instrument for action, not the motive. Whereas ‘power’ expresses moral capacity, ‘good’ expresses moral purpose. The ‘metaphysical discovery’ shows the mind’s imaginative capacity, not its achievement, but it allows us to adjust our motives to suit this new understanding of the self as naturally disinterested and to expand the circle of our sympathy.

d. Conclusion

Natarajan and Park agree that a full appreciation of Hazlitt as a philosopher requires us to explore the philosophy in his criticism and conversational essays as well as in his earlier, more explicitly philosophical works. His role in the conversational essays is to be both an artist and a moralist, to create and to criticize, to entertain and to enlighten, and sometimes to enrage. As Natarajan points out, he constantly revisits favourite themes, qualifying, refining, contradicting, aggregating, and composing. Like Michel de Montaigne, whom he admired, Hazlitt was not afraid to turn the spotlight on himself and to explore his own contradictions. Despite its huge variety, there is a unity in his work, a continuity of interests, and commitments that reaches right back into young adulthood. His ideas and themes continue to deserve to be revisited. Interpretation and appreciation of his philosophy has flourished since Park’s and Natarajan’s books were published, and interesting approaches continue to be explored.

Charles Lamb’s review of the first volume of Table Talk provides a fine assessment of his friend’s achievement:

To an extraordinary power of original observation he adds an equal power of familiar and striking expression… In fact, he all along acts as his own interpreter, and is continually translating his thoughts out of their original metaphysical obscurity into the language of the senses and of common observation. (Lamb, 1980: 306 – 7)

5. References and Further Reading

Bibliographical note: references to Hazlitt’s works are generally to the 21-volume Complete Works, edited by P. P. Howe, and are indicated by CW + volume number.

• Hazlitt’s Complete Works:
• Howe, P. P. (ed.) 1930-34. The Complete Works of William Hazlitt. 21 vols. London: Dent.
  • This is the standard edition of Hazlitt’s writing. It contains texts of the full-length volumes, annotated. Not quite complete. It is available from the Internet Archive.
• Selections, Letters and Memoirs:
• Cook, Jon (ed.). 1998. William Hazlitt: Selected Writings. World’s Classics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A one-volume paperback selection with useful annotations and an introduction. It contains some of Hazlitt’s shorter philosophical essays and some of his aphorisms.
• Dart, Gregory (ed.). 2005. William Hazlitt: Metropolitan Writings. Manchester: Carcanet Press.
  • A collection of Hazlitt’s major metropolitan essays, with a critical introduction on his attitude to London life.
• Dart, Gregory (ed.). 2008. Liber Amoris and Related Writings. Manchester: Carcanet Press.
  • Sets Liber Amoris, Hazlitt’s memoir of the main crisis of his life, in the context of his other writings from 1822-23, with notes and a critical introduction by the editor.
• Hazlitt, William Carew. (ed.) 1867. Memoirs of William Hazlitt. 2 volumes. London: Richard Bentley.
  • Edited by Hazlitt’s grandson. Includes portions of his correspondence. Available from Internet Archive and Forgotten Books.
• Keynes, Geoffrey (ed.). 1948. Selected Essays of William Hazlitt. London: Nonesuch Press.
• Mee, Jon and Grande, James (eds.). 2021. The Spirit of Controversy and Other Essays. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A useful, updated World’s Classics edition. The texts are drawn from the original periodical publications, rather than those subsequently prepared for book publication.
• Paulin, Tom and Chandler, David (eds.). 2000. William Hazlitt: The Fight and Other Writings. London: Penguin
  • Substantial annotated Penguin Classics selection, with an introduction by Tom Paulin.
• Sikes, Herschel Moreland, Bonner, William Hallam, and Lahey, Gerald (eds.). 1978. The Letters of William Hazlitt. New York: New York University Press.
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 1998. The Plain Speaker: The Key Essays. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Paperback selection of some of Hazlitt’s best essays, plus a newly discovered essay, ‘A Half-Length’. Introduction by Tom Paulin.
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 1998. The Selected Writings of William Hazlitt. 9 vols. London: Pickering and Chatto.
  • A major selection: nine-volumes, with updates of Howe’s texts and annotations. Introduction by Tom Paulin. It includes two previously unpublished essays and An Essay on the Principles of Human Action but excludes much of the philosophical writing to be found in CW 20).
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 2007. New Writings of William Hazlitt. 2 vols. Oxford: Oxford University.
  • A collection of 205 more recently discovered writings, including major essays on the poetry of Wordsworth and Coleridge and some late philosophical essays not previously recognised as Hazlitt’s.
• Wu, Duncan. 2014. All That is Worth Remembering: Selected Essays of William Hazlitt. London: Notting Hill Editions.
• Biographies:
• Baker, Herschel 1962. William Hazlitt. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• Grayling, A. C. 2000. The Quarrel of the Age: The Life and Times of William Hazlitt. London: Weidenfeld and Nicholson.
  • A lively biography which appreciates the man and the philosophy.
• Howe, P. P. 1947 (new edition). The Life of William Hazlitt. London: Hamish Hamilton.
  • A standard biography, which draws heavily on Crabb Robinson’s diary. Useful but dated.
• Jones, Stanley. 1989. Hazlitt: A Life. From Winterslow to Frith Street. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • An important critical biography. Covers later part of Hazlitt’s life and work.
• Wu, Duncan. 2008. William Hazlitt: the First Modern Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • An important and substantial biography by a leading Hazlitt scholar.
• Critical and Historical Studies:
• Albrecht, W. P. 1965. Hazlitt and the Creative Imagination. Lawrence, Kan.: University of Kansas Press.
  • A study of Hazlitt’s concept of imagination, his political thought and his literary judgements.
• Barbalet, Jack. 2009. ‘Disinterestedness and Self-Formation: Principles of Action in William Hazlitt’. European Journal of Social Theory, 12 (2), 195 – 211.
• Bromwich, David.1983. Hazlitt: The Mind of a Critic. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major modern study of Hazlitt’s philosophy, politics, criticism, and moral theory. Makes the case for Hazlitt as a major critic.
• Bullitt, J. M. 1945. ‘Hazlitt and the Romantic Conception of the Imagination’. Philological Quarterly, 24.4, 343-61.
• Burley, Stephen. 2014. Hazlitt the Dissenter: Religion, Philosophy, and Politics, 1766-1816. London: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • A major study with an emphasis on the Dissenting tradition’s influence on Hazlitt’s early philosophical and political writing.
• Butler, Marilyn. 1981. Romantics, Rebels and Reactionaries: English Literature and its Background 1760-1830. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major work on the period, it includes a summary of Hazlitt’s career as a radical and characteristically English thinker. It puts the Romantic movement in its historical setting and emphasizes its contradictions.
• Cook, Jon. 2023. ‘Hazlitt’s First acquaintance with Poets’. The Hazlitt Review, 16, 33 – 47.
• Dart, Gregory. 2000. ‘Romantic Cockneyism: Hazlitt and the Periodical Press’. Romanticism 6.2, 143-62.
• Eagleton, Terry. 1973. ‘William Hazlitt: An Empiricist Radical’. New Blackfriars, 54, 108 – 117.
• Eagleton, Terry. 2009. ‘The Critic as Partisan: William Hazlitt’s Radical Imagination’. Harper’s Magazine, 318 (1907), 77 – 82.
• Gilmartin, Kevin. 1996. Print Politics: The Press and Radical Opposition in Early Nineteenth Century England. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Gilmartin, Kevin. 2015. William Hazlitt: Political Essayist. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major study which makes a case for the centrality of Hazlitt’s political thought to his achievement as an essayist.
• Harling, Philip. 1997. ‘William Hazlitt and Radical Journalism’. Romanticism, 3.1, 53-65.
• Hunnekuhl, Philipp. 2017. ‘Hazlitt, Crabb Robinson, and Kant: 1806 and Beyond’. The Hazlitt Review, 10, 45 – 62.
• Johnston, Freya. 2018. ‘Keeping to William Hazlitt’, in Thinking through Style: Non-Fiction Prose of the Long Nineteenth Century. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Kinnaird, John. 1977. ‘Hazlitt, Keats, and the Poetics of Intersubjectivity’. Criticism, 19 (1), 1 – 16.
• Kinnaird, John. 1978. William Hazlitt: Critic of Power. New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Takes ‘power’ to be the unifying theme of Hazlitt’s works, in both its political sense and in the sense of creative energy.
• Lockridge, Laurence S. 1989. The Ethics of Romanticism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Chapter 7 is entitled ‘Hazlitt: Common Sense of a Dissenter.’
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 1995. ‘Hazlitt on the Future of the Self’, Journal of the History of Ideas, 56 (3), 463 – 81.
  • Makes a strong claim for the originality of Hazlitt’s theory of personal identity.
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 2003. ‘Self-Concern from Priestley to Hazlitt’. British Journal for the History of Philosophy,11(3), 499 – 507.
• McFarland, Thomas. 1987.  Romantic Cruxes: The English Essayists and the Spirit of the Age. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Mee, Jon. 2011. Conversable Worlds: Literature, Contention, and Community 1762 – 1830. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Michael, Timothy. 2024. ‘Hazlitt, Disinterestedness, and the Liberty of the Press’. The Review of English Studies, 75 (318), 57 – 74.
• Milnes, Tim. 2000. ‘Seeing in the Dark: Hazlitt’s Immanent Idealism’. Studies in Romanticism, 39 (1), 3 – 25.
• Milnes, Tim. 2003. Knowledge and Indifference in English Romantic Prose. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Milnes, Tim. 2017. ‘“This Happy Nonentity”: Hazlitt, Hume, and the Essay’. The Hazlitt Review, 10, 63 – 72.
• Milnes, Tim. 2019. The Testimony of Sense: Empiricism and the Essay from Hume to Hazlitt. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Mulvihill, James. 1990. ‘Hazlitt and “First Principles”’. Studies in Romanticism, 29 (2), 241 – 255.
• Natarajan, Uttara. 1996. ‘Abstracting Passion: Hazlitt’s Ideal of Power’. New Blackfriars, 77, 276 – 287.
• Natarajan, Uttara. 1998. Hazlitt and the Reach of Sense: Criticism, Morals, and the Metaphysics of Power. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • A major study, focusing on the innate, independent activity of the mind. It makes a case for the importance of the philosophy for the essays and criticism.
• Natarajan, Uttara, Paulin, Tom, Wu, Duncan (eds.). 2005. Metaphysical Hazlitt: Bicentenary Essays. London: Routledge.
  • Commemorates the bicentenary of Hazlitt’s Essay on the Principles of Human Action, with essays by important Hazlitt scholars and philosophers.
• Noxon, James. 1963. ‘Hazlitt as Moral Philosopher’. Ethics, 73 (4), 279 – 283.
• Park, Roy. 1971. Hazlitt and the Spirit of the Age: Abstraction and Critical Theory. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • An important study, relating Hazlitt’s literary works to his painting and to his philosophy, especially his concept of abstraction.
• Paulin, Tom. 1998. The Day-Star of Liberty: William Hazlitt’s Radical Style. London: Faber.
  • A passionate argument for Hazlitt’s status as a prose artist and political radical.
• Philp, Mark. 2020. Radical Conduct: Politics, Sociability and Equality in London 1789 – 1815. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Postle, Martin. 2015. ‘“Boswell Redivivus”: Northcote, Hazlitt, and the British School’. The Hazlitt Review, 8, 5 – 20.
• Rée, Jonathan. 2019. Witcraft: The Invention of Philosophy in English. London: Allen Lane.
  • As well as intellectual portraits of celebrated philosophers there is discussion of the philosophical work of literary authors. A section entitled ‘1801: Politics, Paradise and Personal Identity’ provides a lively narrative concerning Hazlitt’s family, influences, relationships and ideas.
• Schneider, Elisabeth W. 1933. The Aesthetics of William Hazlitt: A Study of the Philosophical Basis of his Criticism. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
• Tomalin, Marcus. 2012. Romanticism and Linguistic Theory: William Hazlitt, Language and Literature. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Wakefield, James. 2021. ‘On Whether William Hazlitt Was A Philosophical Idealist (and Why It Matters’). The Hazlitt Review,14, 5 – 23.
• Wellek, Rene. 1931. Immanuel Kant in England 1793 – 1838. Princeton, N.J: Princeton University Press.
• Whale, John. 2000. ‘Hazlitt and the Limits of the Sympathetic Imagination’, in Imagination under Pressure, 1789-1832: Aesthetics, Politics and Utility. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 110-39.
• Wu, Duncan. 2006. ‘Hazlitt’s Unpublished History of English Philosophy: The Larger Context’. The Library: The Transactions of the Bibliographical Society, 7(1), 25 -64.
• Other Resources:
• Keynes, Geoffrey. 1931. Bibliography of William Hazlitt. London: Nonesuch Press.
• Peter Landry’s Hazlitt Page: http://www.blupete.com/Literature/Essays/WorksHaz.htm.
• Romantic Circles: Home | Romantic Circles (romantic-circles.org).
• The Hazlitt Review, an annual peer-reviewed journal published by the Hazlitt Society.
• The Hazlitt Society: www.ucl.ac.uk/hazlitt-society.
• Other References:
• Lamb, Charles. 1980. Lamb as Critic. R. Park (ed.). London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
• Locke, John. 1975. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. P. H. Nidditch (ed.). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 2000. Naturalization of the Soul: Self and Personal Identity in the Eighteenth Century. London and New York: Routledge.
• Michael, Timothy. 2016. British Romanticism and the Critique of Political Reason. Baltimore, Md: John Hopkins University Press.
• Parfit, Derek. 1987. Reasons and Persons. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Reid, Thomas.1983. Inquiry and Essays. R. E. Beanblossom and K. Lehrer (eds.). Indianapolis, Ind.: Hackett Publishing Company.
• Strawson, Peter. 1964. Individuals: An Essay in Descriptive Metaphysics. London: Methuen University Paperback.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1958. The Blue and Brown Books. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.

Author Information

Graham Nutbrown
Email: gn291@bath.ac.uk
University of Bath
United Kingdom