Metaphysics of Quantum Gravity

The metaphysics of quantum gravity explores metaphysical issues related to research programs in theoretical physics clustered under the term quantum gravity. These research programs aim at the formulation of a theory that reconciles the theory of general relativity with quantum theory. The goal is not necessarily to come up with a unified single theory but, more pragmatically, to describe phenomena with a dual nature, embodying both quantum and relativistic features—such as black holes and the early universe.

Approaches to quantum gravity are not yet fully worked-out theories. Nevertheless, they already provide a certain partial understanding of physical reality in different ways. Remarkably, they do so with a striking similarity: they virtually all deny the existence of some features usually regarded as essential to the existence of spacetime (or space and/or time) such as its four-dimensionality, the existence of distances and durations between events, or even the very partial ordering of events.

This observation is particularly noteworthy, considering the pervasive influence of spatial and temporal organisation on the human mind across various facets of daily life and theoretical thinking, ranging from most ancient religions to contemporary scientific worldviews. The metaphysics of quantum gravity takes as its starting point the puzzling observation that physics could teach us that space and time are not fundamental. It draws on resources from traditional metaphysics to tackle a set of issues related to the possible non-fundamentality of spacetime, and it investigates its potential implications for venerable traditional issues in metaphysics.

The metaphysics of quantum gravity is a relatively small and new research field, and thus as of now, its focus has been on explaining how spacetime could emerge from a more fundamental and non-spatiotemporal ontology. Consequently, this article is equally focused on questions regarding the status of spacetime and the emergence of spacetime. Section 1 situates the field within metaphysics of science more broadly. Sections 2 and 3 investigate, respectively, the status of spacetime in different approaches to quantum gravity and a number of potential issues with its lack of fundamentality. The article then covers the nature of the emerging spatiotemporal ontology (Section 4) and the building relation that relates it to the underlying non-spatiotemporal ontology (Section 5). Section 6 surveys various potential applications of spacetime emergence to a number of debates in metaphysics.

Table of Contents

1. A New Domain
2. Quantum Gravity
   1. String Theory
   2. Loop Quantum Gravity
   3. Causal Set Theory
   4. Is Spacetime Non-Fundamental?
3. Problems with the Non-Fundamentality of Space-time
   1. The Scientific Problem
   2. The Problem of Empirical Coherence
   3. The Ontological Problem
   4. The Conceptual Problem
4. What is Spacetime?
   1. Theoretical Spacetime
   2. Phenomenal Space and Time
5. Bridging the Gap
   1. Functional Realisation
   2. Grounding
   3. Mereological Composition
   4. Eliminativism
6. Implications
   1. Philosophy of Time
   2. Modality, Laws of Nature, Causation
   3. Other Topics
7. References and Further Reading

1. A New Domain

The metaphysics of quantum gravity is both a part of the more general philosophy of quantum gravity, which encompasses other epistemological and technical issues, and of metaphysics. This section situates the metaphysics of quantum gravity in this more general context.

Metaphysics, as traditionally conceived, aims to ascertain the most abstract structure of reality. Some questions metaphysicians are typically concerned with are: What is time? How do objects relate to the spatial regions they occupy? What kind of relation is the one that relates fundamental to non-fundamental entities? Using results from the development of a number of approaches to quantum gravity, the metaphysics of quantum gravity thus pursues the traditional tasks of metaphysics while shifting its perspective in two ways.

First, quantum gravity raises new metaphysical questions—in particular that of how to categorize the nature of spacetime if it turns out not to be fundamental according to fundamental physics. However, as novel as the problems we are confronted with might be, they might lead us to support some philosophical claims that have already been argued for on completely different grounds. Here is one example of such views: we might be led to conclude that spacetime simply does not exist (see Section 5d). Arguments to the effect that space and/or time are unreal have been put forward independently of considerations about quantum gravity (famously so by McTaggart in 1908). Second, quantum gravity might also suggest novel answers to a number of preexisting metaphysical questions (see Section 6). On the one hand, this concerns further metaphysical questions about the nature of space, time, and spacetime, beyond the question of their relation to fundamental reality. On the other hand, an overwhelming number of metaphysical concepts have received analyses that rely on the existence of space and time, or of spacetime. If the fundamentality of spacetime is challenged by quantum gravity, then these analyses are equally called into question—at least in so far as they are supposed to apply to the quantum gravity level.

By taking the preliminary results of quantum gravity research as a basis for philosophical investigation, the metaphysics of quantum gravity belongs to the metaphysics of science: an approach to metaphysics according to which metaphysical arguments, claims and theories should be informed by our best science. The metaphysics of quantum gravity shares many methodological and conceptual resources with other areas of physics-oriented metaphysics. For example, problems of emergence have also been discussed in the context of non-relativistic quantum mechanics regarding the status of space (but, importantly, not of spacetime): if one accepts configuration space realism (Albert 1996, Ney 2012 and Ney 2021b)—according to which the fundamental physical space is a physical counterpart of the high-dimensional mathematical configuration space in which the wavefunction is defined—then the question arises whether and how the four-dimensional spacetime emerges from this underlying structure. In contrast to other areas of the metaphysics of science, however, metaphysicians of quantum gravity do not reflect on empirically established scientific theories but on approaches to quantum gravity that are currently under construction.

The need for a theory of quantum gravity arises from the fact that general relativity and quantum physics can hardly be both entirely correct. General relativity and quantum field theories are our best theories in their respective domains of description. As such, they provide excellent descriptions of the world. However, their predictive and theoretical capacities are effectively limited to these respective domains. General relativity, on the one hand, only produces good results in situations where we can neglect the quantum behaviour of matter. The Standard Model of particle physics, on the other hand, offers an excellent description of quantum matter to the extent to which gravitational phenomena involving high energy can be neglected. We thus lack a theory to fully describe phenomena with both quantum and relativistic features, such as black holes and the early universe. Overall, theoretical physics presents us with a situation involving two distinct frameworks with different physical ideologies or philosophies (here understood as sets of ideas suggestive of an ontology), and in which we have no satisfactory reason to privilege one or other of the ideologies to guide us towards the ontology of the physical world. These two theoretical approaches cannot be easily unified beyond their respective domains. The most conservative attempt is called semi-classical gravity.

The highly speculative character of quantum gravity research might raise doubts about the feasibility and relevance of pursuing a metaphysics of quantum gravity. What if none of the approaches to quantum gravity on the market turn out to be correct? Even worse, what if the successful theory of quantum gravity is so different from past approaches that it does not share any of the features deemed metaphysically important, and that past approaches display?

To react to this challenge, it is useful to distinguish two different strategies one might pursue in doing metaphysics of quantum gravity: one that deals with abstract issues across the board of different approaches to quantum gravity, and one that focuses on specific approaches to quantum gravity. A predominant view is that the work can be divided in this way for at least two reasons. First, pragmatically, working out general issues with spacetime emergence can be helpful to then solve more specific issues. Second, spacetime emergence may be related to general issues from the metaphysics literature with far-reaching implications. Note this strategy does not necessarily require investigating all approaches to quantum gravity. It can also focus on a limited set of approaches or aim at formulating results based on pre-theoretic constraints sufficiently disconnected from the theory, in the guise of what has been dubbed experimental metaphysics by Abner Shimony (Cohen et al., 1997). A notable exception to the separation of labour into these two equally legitimate strategies is Jaksland and Salimkhani (2023), who argue that the only valid metaphysics of quantum gravity should focus on specific approaches. Instead, this article follows the standard distinction between general and specific issues.

Now, let us return to the challenge formulated above. The first formulation of the challenge, which doubted that any of the existing approaches to quantum gravity will turn out to be correct, need not affect the more general strategy: (some of) the general features investigated on that strategy, and their metaphysical consequences, might survive in the correct theory. The second version of the challenge affects both strategies alike. Indeed, most metaphysicians of quantum gravity will reject the very sceptical attitude expressed in this challenge. However, even if current research in quantum gravity is as fundamentally misguided as the challenge suggests, this need not render research into the metaphysical consequences of existing quantum gravity approaches futile: maybe such metaphysical considerations can help to open up conceptual possibilities needed to develop the unheard-of correct theory of quantum gravity.

2. Quantum Gravity

As of December 2024, there is no consensus on what is the most promising approach to formulating a theory of quantum gravity. The most conservative attempt is called semi-classical gravity. It tries to conserve elements of each framework by combining them without drastic modifications. This approach is a conceptually hybrid creature akin to a computational tool, which appears to wear no clear and complete ontological commitment on its sleeves. So, it is natural to regard semi-classical gravity as a mere step on the path to quantum gravity. Beyond that, different approaches have been advanced and are under constant development. String theory, loop quantum gravity and causal set theory, to name some candidates, are at different stages of elaboration. Some of them, like string theory, are mature research programs involving thousands of researchers. Others like causal set theory are still at an even earlier phase of development and involve only dozens of researchers. No empirical test has been able to give the edge to one of these approaches over the others, and experimental procedures are currently being developed (Huggett, Linnemann, and Schneider, 2023).

Approaches to quantum gravity each come with their specific issues, including problems of spacetime emergence. The present section briefly introduces three approaches to quantum gravity, demonstrates how spacetime could fail to be fundamental in these approaches, and discusses the prospects for spacetime to remain fundamental in quantum gravity. The approaches discussed here are by no means exhaustive, and their selection simply reflects the knowledge of the authors of this article. Other popular approaches that are philosophically fruitful include but are not limited to: canonical quantum gravity, group field theory, shape dynamics, asymptotic safety, Penrose’s gravitationally-induced collapse approach, non-commutative geometry and causal dynamical triangulation.

a. String Theory

String theory is the most popular research programme in quantum gravity. (For easy-going presentations, see Greene 1999; Dawid 2013; Zimmerman Jones and Sfondrini 2022; for textbooks see Zwiebach 2009; Blumenhagen et al. 2013; Tomasiello 2022.) According to a rough understanding of the formalism, reality is constituted by one-dimensional strings, and other higher-dimensional entities called “branes.” Those entities have various properties, such as vibrations, size and topology. A number of states of this underlying ontology correspond to the particles of the Standard Model of particle physics. Some states of closed strings correspond to the graviton, the particle posited to mediate the gravitational interaction. There is not one but five string theories, and they are usually regarded as approximating an even more fundamental theory. (For an introduction to string theory aimed at philosophers, see Le Bihan 2023.)

String theory jeopardises the fundamentality of spacetime in at least three different ways.

First, for reasons of mathematical consistency, the background spacetime has not four but rather ten dimensions: nine spatial dimensions and one temporal dimension. The dimensionality of spacetime thus becomes problematic, and a story about the emergence of the four-dimensional spacetime from a ten-dimensional spacetime is required. To make things even worse, the five ten-dimensional theories are conjectured to approximate a more fundamental, non-approximative, eleven-dimensional theory called M-theory, involving ten spatial dimensions and one temporal dimension, or perhaps a twelve-dimensional, non-approximative, theory named F-theory, postulating ten spatial dimensions and two temporal dimensions.

Second, the five string theories can be described as quantum field theories on two-dimensional worldsheets that one can visualise, at least to some good approximation, as the extension of one-dimensional strings in an external temporal direction, just as we can view the trajectory of a particle in time as a spacetime line, a one-dimensional worldline, in the more familiar relativistic context (Le Bihan, 2020, Section 3). This worldsheet perspective presents us with a picture of quantum fields fluctuating on a two-dimensional manifold, and strings and branes do not exist qua objects. The manifold’s metric is conformally invariant, strongly suggesting that there is no matter of fact about distances and durations between elements of the manifold. If the worldsheet approach has ontological teeth, then we need to understand the emergence of the relativistic four-dimensional spacetime of general relativity from a two-dimensional surface lacking meaningful notions of distance and durations between its elements.

Third, the five string theories have a surprising feature. They have been shown to be empirically equivalent in a remarkable way, casting doubt on the very existence of the spacetime in relation to which they are defined. They are not merely empirically equivalent but also physically equivalent in a stronger sense. The empirical equivalence of two theories can be defined as the existence of a systematic correspondence between the quantities of all possible measurable quantities, such that empirical evidence cannot decide in favour of one of the theories over the other. Physical equivalence is a stricter condition insofar as there is also a systematic correspondence between the unobservable quantities of the two theories, thus generating inter-theoretical “giant symmetries” (De Haro and Butterfield, 2021, p. 2974). Those are called ‘duality relations’, between duality-related models and theories, and duality-related quantities. The philosophy of duality is usually approached in a very mathematical and non-metaphysical way (but see Le Bihan and Read (2018); Le Bihan (2023) for an introduction and discussion of the ontology of duality aimed at philosophers). Duality has been used to argue against the reality of the ten-dimensional spacetime, since duality-related models of the two theories will not share the spacetime metric (T-duality) and sometimes not even the same topology (mirror symmetry) (Huggett 2017; Matsubara and Johansson 2018). There is therefore no general agreement on the exact ontology of string theory, but there are strong reasons to doubt that the structure we refer to as spacetime in relativistic physics remains present at the more fundamental level described by string theory.

Aside from questions over the fundamentality of spacetime, string theory leads to questions regarding the reality, fundamentality and ontological categorisation of strings and branes: are strings genuinely fundamental objects according to the general framework of string theory, or are the branes the only fundamental entities of the approach (Le Bihan, 2023)? That strings should be eliminated from the ontology of string theory in favour of branes can be motivated by the fact that M-theory appears to merely include branes and not one-dimensional strings. The opposite view that strings are more fundamental than branes has also been defended, but in the context of the five string theories (Vistarini, 2019).

b. Loop Quantum Gravity

Unlike string theory that starts with a modification of the Standard Model of particle physics and tries to recover gravity, loop quantum gravity (LQG) is a general-relativity-first approach. Similarly, it is a geometry-first approach in that it focuses on the construction of spacetime and the gravitational field, without taking into account the quantum physics of matter. This section presents an extremely condensed and superficial version of their Chapter 6 focused on the emergence of space and time in LQG.

LQG refers to two distinct approaches: canonical loop quantum gravity and covariant loop quantum gravity (Rovelli, 2004; Rovelli and Vidotto, 2014).

Canonical LQG is built on a Hamiltonian reformulation of general relativity that is easier to quantise than the standard formulation. This formulation of general relativity goes against the original spirit of general relativity by forcing a foliation of the spacetime into an objective ordering of three-dimensional spaces and a universal time, thereby ruling out solutions of the theory that cannot be foliated this way (the non-globally-hyperbolic solutions). Then, to move from classical spacetime to a quantum structure, those classical three-dimensional spaces are transformed into quantum states via a technical procedure called canonical quantisation, and those are supposed to be in states of quantum superpositions, like quantum matter in textbook quantum mechanics. These three-dimensional quantum states are defined over a Hilbert space (the mathematical configuration space that describes the possible states of the system at hand). Those are spin networks states, which can be described by combinatorial graphs of links and nodes, and by numbers associated with both links and nodes.

Prima facie, the naive ontology of LQG appears to be one of a quantum superposition of discrete elements (the links and nodes) and one might be tempted to argue that spacetime just is this quantum structure. However, four reasons at least can be provided for why this structure differs significantly from spacetime.

First, according to a number of interpretations of quantum mechanics, its ontology is metaphysically indeterminate (one popular exception being the many-worlds interpretation, see Glick and Le Bihan 2024). By being quantum, the fundamental LQG structure could thus be metaphysically indeterminate as well. Whether geometry needs to be well-determined to pretend to the status of spacetime remains debated and might relate closely to the question of whether the world in general harbours metaphysical indeterminacy.

Second, the spatial status of the spin networks can be questioned because of disordered locality. Many models of LQG have adjacency relations between their elements that diverge from the adjacency relations existing between the corresponding elements in the general relativity description, taken to approximate the underlying LQG ontology. The well-defined ordering of events around us could thus turn out to be a statistical approximation, such that when zooming in on the deep fabric of spacetime, we would find anomalies such as adjacency relations that correspond to long spacetime intervals.

Third, there is a problem of frozen dynamics called the problem of time, because the time variable appears to be missing from the equations supposed to describe the evolution of spin networks. Thus, both time and change appear to be at best perspectival or relational, describing relations between specific sub-systems in the universe. But there no longer seems to be any strong sense of a physical system evolving with respect to the rest of the universe.

Fourth, not all spin network states of the underlying structure are expected to give rise to an effectively spatiotemporal geometry. Thus, at best, spacetime could be identical to a spacetime state or property of the underlying ontology, but not to the bearer of the state or property itself.

The second version of LQG is covariant LQG. It describes a four-dimensional extension of spin networks called “spinfoams.” Because of technical difficulties with the canonical approach, most efforts in the LQG community focus on developing the spinfoam framework these days. It exploits a path integral approach to dynamical evolution. A path integral formulation computes the evolution of a physical state from an initial state to final state by weighting all the possible paths between the initial state and the final state. Moving to LQG, the paths are identified with spinfoam trajectories, roughly understood as spin network “evolutions.”

The covariant approach performs well for local descriptions of spacetime regions limited to the astrophysical scale. This contrasts with the canonical approach, which can be deployed to produce simplified toy models of the entire cosmos, resulting in the loop quantum cosmology, not unlike the Λ-CDM model, the standard model of cosmology, which exploits highly simplified models of general relativity to deliver cosmological models of the whole universe (see Bojowald 2011 in physics, and Huggett and Wüthrich 2018, Section 3 for a philosophy of physics perspective). On the contrary, covariant LQG requires feeding the equations with a lot of information about the boundary conditions, both at the beginning and at the end, but also on the spatial edges of the spacetime region being described, and thus operates better on the astrophysical than on the cosmological scale.

Among the four reasons to deny the fundamental status of spacetime in canonical LQG, three remain in covariant LQG. What remains is both metaphysical indeterminacy and disordered locality, with the possible exception of the many-world interpretation. However, there does not seem to be a problem of time since the dynamics is understood as the solution of a set of constraints between the initial and the final state (and not as the evolution of a state according to equations that do not feature a time parameter, like in the Hamiltonian formulation of the canonical approach). As for the fourth reason, namely that certain states of the underlying ontology do not embed a spacetime profile, that certainly continues to be the case with the covariant approach: not all states trigger a spacetime geometry, and even those who do are quantum superpositions of more fine-grained states, some of them failing to be spacetime-like.

c. Causal Set Theory

Causal set theory (CST) aims to rebuild the seemingly continuous spacetime world from a discrete structure of elements and partial ordering relations between these elements (Bombelli et al., 1987; Rideout and Sorkin, 1999; Dowker, 2006, 2013; Major et al., 2009; Rideout and Wallden, 2009). Unlike string theory, which seeks to push the Standard Model further, and loop quantum gravity, which strives to generalize general relativity to the quantum realm, CST sets out to reconstruct familiar physics from scratch from a new paradigm. The structures of partially ordered elements, causal sets, are expected to collectively give rise to spacetime and its material content, as described by, at least up to a good approximation, the general theory of relativity. The approach is premised on a theorem from general relativity (Malament, 1977), which states that the metric structure of a spacetime region can be derived from its causal structure, up to a conformal factor. This technical result has been taken to suggest that almost all the structure of a spacetime region could be built from scratch from the causal structure of said region. Causal set theory attempts this construction.

Causal sets are usually described as evolving through the operation of a dynamical law that adds elements one-by-one, connecting them to the pre-existing stage of the causal set (although this description might be misleading as will be explained below). The approach tries to develop a number of different dynamics in order to reproduce, up to some approximation, a class of models of general relativity consistent with the actual world.

CST offers a clear framework for discussing the possible emergence of continuous from discrete structures. Whether causal set theory should be interpreted as a case of spacetime emergence is still debated, as two main philosophical interpretations of the ontology of CST are in competition. According to the growing block approach, CST suggests an interestingly novel and radical form of the growing block theory of time, which is standardly defined as the view that the past and the present exist, but the future does not. The flow of time is then identified with the coming into existence of new slices of existence, at the border of the past-present block, and the future. With CST, there is no longer a sharp differentiation between three regions of reality, the past, the present and the future, as the coming into existence of being takes the form of single elements (single building blocks of a local time) instead of three-dimensional hypersurfaces (global times). The growing block interpretation to CST has been defended by physicists (Dowker, 2006, 2014) and assessed by philosophers (Earman 2008, Wüthrich and Callender 2016).

The growing block approach to CST differs from the traditional growing block theory in a number of ways. First, the growth is only local and there is often no definite matter of fact regarding which element from a pair of elements comes into existence before the other. The growing of causal sets can be thought of as happening in various directions, a visual simplification to emphasise that the ordering between the elements is merely partial. This local growth is better visualised as a growing octopus, or n-pus, than as an expanding block (Le Bihan, 2020). Another implication of the model is a commitment to metaphysical indeterminacy of a new kind (Wüthrich and Callender, 2016). This metaphysical indeterminacy is new by applying not only to the future but also to the past of the growing block structure. Indeed, due to a property of the dynamics called “discrete general covariance,” it is (seemingly metaphysically) indeterminate which past configuration of the set, among a number of distinct possible configurations, led to any particular configuration in the growth of the octopus. This might generate contradictions motivating an alternative interpretation of the ontology of CST.

According to a natural alternative ontological interpretation, the growth description is merely heuristic, and we should really think of the maximal set produced at the limit of the dynamics (intuitively, when the process of elements coming into existence is infinitely complete) as a perspicuous representation of reality (Huggett, 2014). This approach is thus in the spirit of the blockhead interpretation of general relativity. The view still includes metaphysical indeterminacy but does not appear to generate problematic contradictions.

Other metaphysical issues discussed in relation to CST include: Is CST committed to a form of realism about causation (Wüthrich and Huggett 2020)? Could a fundamental ontology of causal relations ground or compose a derivative ontology of spacetime relations (Baron and Le Bihan, 2022a, 2024)?

d. Is Spacetime Non-Fundamental?

Is spacetime really non-fundamental according to most approaches to quantum gravity? Negative answers have been articulated or voiced by a number of scholars. They can be categorised in two classes: a priori and empirical.

The first category of objections to non-fundamental spacetime is a priori in that it is not grounded in the analysis of specific approaches to quantum gravity, but in a priori motivations that have nothing to do with the content of theoretical physics. Such objections can be made based on the claim that the non-fundamentality of spacetime stands in the way of our conception of concrete physical entities (Lam and Esfeld, 2013, p. 287), or that the concept of spacetime involves the property of fundamentality (Baker, 2021, Section 6). More generally, there is a long tradition in metaphysics to associate physicality to spatiotemporality, and the notion of a fundamental spacetime plays indeed a central role in many metaphysical views. Whether those views can be amended to account for fundamentally non-spatiotemporal reality constitutes another direction of research in the metaphysics of quantum gravity (which we turn to in Section 6), and one can see the conservative pressure coming from analytic metaphysics to preserve the rock-bottom fundamental status of spacetime.

A second type of reason to doubt that spacetime is not fundamental is empirical (see, for example, Esfeld 2021). Two lines of reasoning in this direction are possible. First, it could be that the correct theory of quantum gravity will be one that does not question the fundamentality of spacetime. This could potentially happen with a number of approaches to quantum gravity, as working out their ontology remains a vast project. For example, although the received view of canonical quantum gravity is that time disappears in a problematic way (Huggett and Thébault, 2023), the claim remains disputed (Chua and Callender, 2021). Turning to another example and as mentioned before, according to a certain version of causal set theory endorsed by Dowker (2014), spacetime fundamentally exists, although in a peculiar way. Another possible view in that direction is Bohmian quantum gravity, which would extend the Bohmian interpretation of non-relativistic quantum mechanics not only to quantum field theories, but also to quantum gravity (Vassallo and Esfeld 2014). Second, it could be that one of the theories of quantum gravity generally considered to deny crucial features of spacetime actually turns out not to deny them and could be reinterpreted differently in the future.

3. Problems with the Non-Fundamentality of Space-time

This section surveys a number of philosophical problems that emerge if spacetime does not exist fundamentally according to quantum gravity. Intuitively, that physical reality could fail to be fundamentally spatiotemporal appears troublesome: it clashes drastically with the way we usually conceive of the world as being fundamentally spatial and temporal, and with the scientific method, which seems to be based on collecting observations localised in space and time. Sections 3a to 3d review a number of problems resulting from different ways of making the nature of the clash precise and discuss what has or needs to be done to address them. The order in which the problems are presented reflects the extent to which their solution can be expected to follow from physics alone.

a. The Scientific Problem

The scientific problem is the problem of providing a theoretical derivation of spacetime physics from a non-spatiotemporal physics, namely a derivation of our best physics from a theory of quantum gravity. This should be done for two frameworks: general relativity and quantum physics. This problem is scientific in that it is an actual problem that quantum gravity physicists are facing. Indeed, absent new and independent empirical evidence, the most reliable guiding principle in the formulation of a theory of quantum gravity is the ability of the latter to derive our currently best, empirically-confirmed theoretical frameworks in physics—namely, general relativity and the Standard Model of particle physics based on a family of quantum field theories. Applied to spacetime, the problem amounts to the possibility of deriving, at least as a mathematical approximation and with bridge principles between the primitive notions of the two theories, the piece of apparatus that plays the spacetime role in general relativity and quantum field theories from a non-spatiotemporal theory of quantum gravity, along a heterogeneous Nagelian reduction (Nagel, 1979).

The problem has a different form depending on whether the focus is on general relativity or quantum physics. General relativity is a very successful theory in the low-energy regime of description that came with its share of conceptual revolutions—for example, with the possibility of intrinsically curved and expanding geometries. If spacetime is not fundamental, then how can this success be accounted for, and how should we rethink the conceptual revolutions mentioned above? A possible answer is that deriving general relativity as an approximation from the theory of quantum gravity would suffice to explain its predictive power—we should then look for conceptual revolutions in the new theory. The lessons learned from general relativity could then perish or survive the move to the new theory. The issue thus becomes the task of building one model (that is, solution) of general relativity consistent with the distribution of matter in the actual world from a solution to a theory of quantum gravity. This has been done to some degree, for example in string theory where the metric field—standardly regarded as representing spacetime in general relativity—can be described as a coherent state of an underlying ontology of strings and branes (Huggett and Vistarini, 2015).

When it comes to quantum physics, quantum gravity physicists do not focus on non-relativistic quantum mechanics, as is often the case in the metaphysics of quantum physics, but instead on quantum field theories, a class of which correspond to the Standard Model of particle physics. The Standard Model describes fundamental particles and fields, such as electrons and quarks, groups them into families, and provides a catalogue of their possible interactions. The Standard Model incorporates the relativistic effects described by special relativity, yet it does not account for the gravitational aspects of general relativity. As of 2025, a comprehensive quantum field theory approach to gravity is missing. A low-energy approach to quantum gravity has been developed, but it cannot be extended to high-energy interactions (Wallace 2022). The Standard Model should be derived via approximations procedures from a more comprehensive theory of quantum gravity.

The scientific problem may take different guises, depending on the approach to quantum gravity under study. For instance, in the context of string theory, a number of quantum field theories have been derived from string theory solutions. However, none of those quantum field theories are the right ones, namely the ones involved in the Standard Model of particle physics. The number of solutions to string theory is incredibly large, making it, apparently, virtually impossible to get our hands on solutions corresponding to the Standard Model. This is the infamous landscape problem (Read and Le Bihan 2021).

Overall, the scientific problem is a problem for scientists, one that should be carefully distinguished from more philosophical issues introduced below.

b. The Problem of Empirical Coherence

The problem of empirical coherence for spacetime emergence arises when considering physical theories positing that spacetime does not exist fundamentally, while being simultaneously established on empirical evidence manifestly localised in space and time. A similar problem was first formulated in the context of quantum mechanics by Barrett (1996), pointing out at the tension between an ontology of so-called local beables and a realism about the wave function. It was then discussed by Healey (2002) for canonical quantum gravity, and systematically studied for a wide range of quantum gravity approaches by Huggett and Wüthrich (2013).

The formulation of the problem of empirical coherence usually employs the now standard concept of local beable introduced by Bell (1987). The beables of a theory are the things the theory postulates as being physically real. They are deemed “be-able” because they manifest as degrees of freedom, that is, determinable properties that can take on various determinate values. Beables are local if they have a location in space and time. Local beables are regarded as crucial for the possibility of observation, and hence for the empirical justification of theories in physics. Thus, the problem goes, a theory that would deny the fundamental existence of spacetime would appear to be empirically incoherent: the truth of the theory would erode the reasons that initially motivated endorsement of the theory.

Local beables already appear to be lacking in wave-function ontologies, prompting many questions on how to interpret the fundamental ontology of non-relativistic quantum mechanics (Albert, 1996; Ney, 2021b). According to this interpretation of non-relativistic quantum mechanics, configuration space realism (also called wave function realism or wave function fundamentalism), the fundamental ontology of the theory is a distribution of quantitative properties, a physical counterpart of the mathematical wave function. Importantly, those properties are not localised within the ordinary three-dimensional space but in a modal space whose regions correspond to possible configurations of physical systems in the three-dimensional space—the so-called configuration space. This configuration space is a mathematical tool designed to facilitate calculation. Its dimensionality corresponds to the number of apparent particles in the physical system being described. Configuration space realism goes beyond regarding the mathematical space as a mere calculation convenience. It states that the mathematical configuration space reflects the existence of an actual, physical configuration space. Consequently, the fundamental arena of reality would be this configuration space, not the three-dimensional space.

An especially difficult issue is then to understand the relation between this fundamental configuration space wherein the wave-function is defined, on the one hand, and the emergent, ordinary three-dimensional space, on the other hand. Configuration space realism faces the charge of being incoherent, since the ordinary space and its local beables are not part of the fundamental ontology of the theory (Maudlin, 2007). However, it has been noticed that local beables are not logically necessary for the possibility of observation (Ney, 2015). Inter-subjective accessibility to evidence localised in configuration space might turn out be just as effective as the more intuitive accessibility to three-dimensional objects localised in space and time.

An important difference between non-relativistic quantum mechanics and quantum gravity is the status of time. In non-relativistic quantum mechanics, time is regarded as a fixed external parameter. What is at stake for configuration space realism, then, is the possible emergence of the ordinary space from the more fundamental configuration space, both located inside a non-relativistic external time. Some proponents of configuration space realism in the context of quantum mechanics take time to be necessary for observation, as temporality is an explicit part in virtually all formal theories of empirical confirmation (Ney, 2015). The problem of empirical coherence thus appears to be much more difficult in the context of quantum gravity, when it is spacetime and not only space that comes under attack.

A somewhat natural thought is that the empirical coherence of a quantum gravity theory can be straightforwardly achieved by asserting that spacetime exists, yet not fundamentally, thus divorcing existence from fundamentality (Huggett and Wüthrich, 2013; Wüthrich, 2017). That is, we can establish the empirical coherence of theories of quantum gravity by formally deriving the general-relativistic spacetime from the more fundamental theory of quantum gravity. But such a formal derivation will not suffice to establish the reality of spacetime. Additionally, the mathematical derivation needs to be “physically salient”: it cannot be a mere mathematical curiosity. That spacetime exists in a non-fundamental way can thus be understood as the claim that it is physically salient, yet not fundamental. Spacetime would exist over and above the fundamental ontology of quantum gravity, for instance as a structure permeating the ontology of quantum gravity. Whether physical salience can be freed from fundamental spatiotemporality remains debated. Huggett and Wüthrich (2013) argue that it does; Maudlin (2007) argues that it does not. The problem of empirical coherence thus intersects with the problem of whether spacetime really exists, and if so how exactly. Positing the existence of a non-fundamental spacetime could be key to solving the problem of empirical coherence. Other solutions might merely require positing the existence of non-local beables that do not require the existence of a non-fundamental spacetime. More work remains to be done to review issues of empirical coherence related to the non-fundamentality of time beyond the non-fundamentality of space.

c. The Ontological Problem

The ontological problem is the related problem of the status of spacetime. Is spacetime real? And if so, what does it mean that it is not fundamental? If not, how can we make sense of the world around us, which definitely seems to be spatial and temporal? Answers to this question belong to one of the three following strands: eliminativism, reductionism and dualism. Eliminativism about spacetime claims that spacetime is not fundamental because it does not exist at all. Spacetime would be a sort of theoretical artefact, and even space and time might turn out to be akin to perceptual illusions. A second option is to maintain the existence of spacetime and to identify it with (parts of) the non-spatiotemporal structure. Finally, according to dualism, spacetime exists and is distinct from the fundamental structure. To spell out such a dualist account, one should specify how the non-spatiotemporal structure relates to the spatiotemporal one. See Section 5 for an overview of different candidate relations.

It is an intricate issue whether a specific solution to the problem of empirical coherence implies a certain answer to the question of the ontological status of spacetime. As shown below, this might be so for some, but not necessarily all proposed solutions to the problem of empirical coherence. Also, someone who denies that there is any problem of empirical coherence can agree that the question of the ontological status of spacetime should receive some answer.

d. The Conceptual Problem

The claim that space and time do not exist fundamentally might at first be met with scepticism. For how could it possibly be the case that the physical world is not spatial and not temporal? The claim raises concerns as it goes against the deep belief in the fundamentality of space and time. Does the non-fundamentality of spacetime present a conceptual problem in light of those beliefs? Unlike the scientific and empirical coherence issues, this conceptual problem calls into question the coherence and metaphysical plausibility of the view that spacetime could fail to be fundamental.

The problem can be elaborated more precisely in the following way. It relies on an experience of discrepancy between non-spatiotemporal and spatiotemporal concepts that cannot be fully addressed by gesturing at a formal reduction of a theory involving the first set of concepts to another theory involving the other concepts. Or, at the very least, more needs to be said on how to relate primitive spatiotemporal concepts to primitive non-spatiotemporal concepts, beyond a simple analysis in terms of bridge principles relating them, as in heterogeneous Nagelian reductions (Nagel, 1979). One wants to know if there is something so specific in spatiotemporal concepts that they could not possibly be explained away in terms of non-spatiotemporal concepts.

Whether the emergence of spacetime really poses a conceptual problem is controversial. It has been disputed to what extent an analogy with the hard conceptual problem of consciousness, which is supposed to illustrate what the conceptual problem of spacetime emergence consists in, can be carried through. The idea behind the analogy is that, just as there might be a hard problem for explaining the relations between physical and mental entities, one could ask whether there is something akin to spacetime qualia or spacetime qualities (those are not supposed to be mental in this context), analogous to qualia in the philosophy of mind (Le Bihan, 2021). Qualia in the philosophy of mind are potential “what is it like to be conscious” properties, especially difficult to reduce to purely physical entities. Likewise, one might wonder if there are “what it is to be spacetime” properties, especially difficult to reduce to purely non-spatiotemporal entities.

The existence of spacetime qualia has been denied by Knox (2014) and Lam and Wüthrich (2018). Le Bihan (2021) argues that the concept at least should be taken seriously, as the existence of a conceptual discrepancy associated to irreducible spacetime qualities might ground the intuition shared by a number of scholars that spacetime cannot possibly fail to be fundamental. The conceptual problem of spacetime would thus be a hard problem of spacetime, similar to the hard problem of consciousness. Overall, realising that there is no hard problem could alleviate the worry that spacetime emergence is logically or physically incoherent, by insisting that resistance to the logical or physical possibility of spacetime emergence originates in deceiving cognitive, pre-theoretical intuitions.

Another formulation of the hard problem can be expressed as the concern that it would be impossible to understand a non-spatiotemporal theory. However, by dissociating understanding from conceivability, it could be granted that we cannot imagine a world without spacetime, and yet still be able to understand it in a more theoretical way. This would require a conception of understanding that does not require visual imagination as a prerequisite for understanding. Rather, for instance, understanding might require the ability to use the theory in certain ways (De Haro and W. de Regt, 2020).

4. What is Spacetime?

Investigating the status of spacetime in quantum gravity requires to agree beforehand about the defining features of spacetime. What is this phenomenon or theoretical entity that is supposed to emerge from the non-spatiotemporal ontology? Spacetime is a generic term that can be associated to a number of more precise concepts. These concepts can be classified in two broad families. First, conceptions of theoretical spacetime are built on notions found in theoretical physics, and especially in special and general relativity as these are our standard theories of spacetime. Second, conceptions of phenomenal spacetime build on the phenomenology of spatial and temporal phenomena, rooted in our perceptual experience of the world. For instance, space, time, motion, repetitions, local beables (localised objects) and, more generally, any notion essentially tied, at least to some degree, to our concepts of space and time, altogether constitute this broad class of spatial and temporal phenomena.

This section surveys various conceptions of theoretical spacetime and phenomenal spacetime, and how they constitute reasonable targets for the recovering of spacetime in the context of quantum gravity.

a. Theoretical Spacetime

The most obvious concept of spacetime to be recovered from a non-spatiotemporal ontology is the one appearing in theoretical physics. However, an immediate challenge for this project is that there might be more than one concept of spacetime in theoretical physics. First, theoretical physics is not a monolithic block. It is made of a number of distinct theoretical frameworks, and spacetime is not conceptualised in the same way in all of these approaches. Second, even in general relativity, arguably our most solid and advanced theory of spacetime, there is no universal consensus on the nature of spacetime. Let us review the two issues in turn.

Spacetime seems to enjoy a special affiliation with special relativity and, by extension, general relativity. The first scientific concept of spacetime was put forward by Hermann Minkowski in 1908, providing a beautiful and compelling formulation of special relativity. Both Minkowski’s flat spacetime and the curved pseudo-Riemannian spacetime of general relativity appear to be prime candidates for spacetime recovery. And as the Minkowskian spacetime of special relativity appears to be a local approximation of the spacetime of general relativity when curvature is negligible, or can be neglected for various purposes, the pseudo-Riemannian concept of general relativity would seem to be the most suitable target for a definition of spacetime.

However, it seems at least logically possible to temper this demand for a special relation with relativistic physics and envision spacetime as a more autonomous notion, which, although born from special relativity, could feature in other, potentially non-relativistic, theories. For consider Newtonian physics. It may be reformulated and generalised using a four-dimensional ideology, resulting in the Newton-Cartan theory (Cartan, 1923). Thus, whether the only viable concept of theoretical spacetime is the one found in general relativity is a legitimate concern (Baron and Le Bihan, 2022c). However, there is no doubt that the concept of spacetime found in general relativity is of paramount importance for analysing the emergence of spacetime. Hence, setting aside other possible targets for the theoretical concept of spacetime, we now focus on the spacetime concepts from special and general relativity.

The geometric approach is the standard interpretation of special and general relativity. In fact, for many it is not even an “interpretation” of the theory; it is an essential feature of the theory itself. Consider first special relativity. Its geometric interpretation states that special-relativistic effects—including time dilation and length contraction—manifest the geometric structure of the four-dimensional Minkowski spacetime. This geometric structure exists in itself and is metaphysically independent of the rest of the world. This interpretation, pioneered by Minkowski, became the standard reading of special relativity, eventually gaining acceptance from Einstein himself despite his initial reservations. This spacetime structure is a four-dimensional manifold equipped of a metric field, describing how things can and cannot move when acted upon by other material systems. Importantly, the structure delineates the respective perimeters of inertial and non-inertial motion. Both non-massive and massive bodies, when not acted upon by other bodies, follow straight lines in space.

However, Einstein was not completely satisfied by the geometric approach to special relativity, pointing out that this spacetime is acting upon matter but cannot be acted upon (Brown and Pooley, 2006). That goes against a deeply-wired principle of action/reaction typical of substances—understand, of real entities. Interestingly, the action/reaction principle comes back with general relativity. The geometric spacetime of general relativity also reacts to the presence of massive bodies. Indeed, massive bodies curve spacetime around them, notably explaining the presence of what we effectively perceive as a force of gravitation pulling things towards massive objects. Einstein’s initial reservations about the geometric approach thereby disappear when factoring in the dynamic backlash of matter on spacetime, in the context of general relativity. The geometrical approach thus remains the standard view; spacetime is a structure existing on its own partially responsible (together with the dynamical laws) for the motion of material systems. Ignoring the vivid debates about the status of the relation between the metric field and the manifolds on the one hand, and between the metric field and matter fields on the other, this metric field constitutes the target of the recovery of spacetime when one subscribes to the geometrical approach.

Consider now the competing dynamical approach, which was championed by Harvey Brown and developed in details by the Oxford philosophy of physics group (Brown 2005, Brown and Pooley 2001, Brown and Pooley 2006, Read et al. 2018). It demotes the Minkowski spacetime from its fundamental status by analysing relativistic effects as properties of the dynamics of material bodies (more precisely of the symmetries of the dynamical laws). The dynamical approach relocates the origin of special-relativistic effects from the ontological category of spacetime to the ontological category of laws. It is thereby better suited to special relativity than to general relativity. Indeed, if relativistic effects are the manifestations of symmetries of the dynamical laws, and not of spacetime, then there is a bit of mystery as to why the symmetries of the metric field coincide with the symmetries of the matter fields. An immediate reply is that one could be realist about the metric field without identifying it to the spacetime geometry. The metric field should thus be rethought not as a representation of an independent spacetime, but rather of another material field. Accordingly, Brown expresses sympathies for Rovelli’s view that the metric field is another material field, the world being composed of fields on top of fields (Brown, 2005, p. 159-160). Overall, the prospects for applying the dynamical approach to general relativity remain highly debated.

The question then arises as to whether the general relativistic concept of spacetime to be derived from the physics of quantum gravity should be that of the relationist in spirit dynamical approach or that of the substantivalist in spirit geometric approach. The dynamical approach (by already unreifying spacetime to a great extent) might be easier to identify with an emerging structure. So, if the dynamical and geometrical approaches turn out to be empirically equivalent, considering general relativity in the dynamical apparatus might be the right kind of re-conceptualisation to narrow the explanatory gap between the general theory of relativity and a non-spatiotemporal theory of quantum gravity. It has been argued, however, that it might be easier to relate a dynamical reading of spacetime to a non-spatiotemporal theory of gravity, since the very existence of spacetime (in technical parlance, the chronogeometricity of the metric field) turns out to be contingent by depending on the actual coupling of the metric field with the matter fields (Le Bihan and Linnemann, 2019).

Since the geometrical and dynamical approaches are regarded as interpretations of the formalism of general relativity, it is reasonable to expect the two approaches to be empirically equivalent. This justifies taking a step back and asking whether spacetime should not rather be understood in a more abstract way, by what it does. What is more, the dynamical approach being more difficult to square with general relativity than with special relativity, it has been argued that the dynamical approach should culminate in a functionalist rewriting or adjustment of Brown’s original project (Knox, 2019).

Spacetime functionalism is a wide range family of views that either attempts to understand the concept of spacetime in functionalist terms in relativistic physics (Knox, 2011, 2014, 2019), or attempts to analyse the relation of spacetime emergence in the context of quantum gravity (Lam and Wüthrich, 2018, 2021; Yates, 2021; Chalmers, 2021). We focus here on the functionalist concept of spacetime; the functionalist approach to the relation of emergence will be discussed in Section 5.1.

According to a broad definition of spacetime functionalism, spacetime is the theoretical concept that appears in general relativity (or possibly as mentioned above, any other relevant spacetime theory in physics). For consider the Ramsey sentence for general relativity. This sentence is a definition of spacetime in relation of all its relevant predicates in the context of general relativity. Spacetime is the entity selected by the variable in the sentence, namely the entity that plays all the spacetime roles described by the Ramsey sentence. Hence the slogan that spacetime is as spacetime does. What this spacetime role or roles are, exactly, remains highly debated. According to a popular account by Knox (2019), spacetime is associated with inertial motion.

Two other views, similar but distinct from spacetime functionalism, can be articulated. One is spacetime operationalism (see, for example, Le Bihan and Linnemann 2019; Menon 2021). It states that spacetime is the entity recorded by rods and clocks, concrete tools used for probing the structure of spacetime. It bears similarity with spacetime functionalism, by sharing the slogan that spacetime is as spacetime does (in this case, what it does on probes made of matter fields, namely the rods and clocks). However, there is an important difference between spacetime functionalism and spacetime operationalism. While the first position identifies spatiotemporal roles within the physical theory, the second associates them with experimental practice, as the structure that explains the nature of the data collected (the movement and direction of the rods, the durations measured by the clocks). In light of all the (too) many conceptions of spacetime, another option is spacetime quietism. This is the view that we cannot agree on what is the right analysis of spacetime (Baron and Le Bihan, 2022c). Because of the plurality of views on the proper theoretical conception of spacetime, future agreement of the different participants in the discussion appears indeed unlikely. Spacetime quietism is the view that it is not necessary to agree on the theoretical nature of spacetime to make progress with the problems of spacetime, motivating a shift towards more phenomenal concepts of space and time. Before moving to the phenomenal notions, it should be noted however that the scientific problem (Section 3a) makes it necessary to attribute a special status to the derivation of general relativity from a theory of quantum gravity (since it is one of the very ingredients in the development of any theory of quantum gravity). It will be thus necessary to derive at least one particular conceptions of theoretical spacetime consistent with general relativity to address the scientific problem. In the next section, we turn to phenomenal conceptions of space and time as an alternative potential target of metaphysical recovery.

b. Phenomenal Space and Time

The shift to the way things appear to us might justify abandoning the notion of theoretical spacetime in favour of the two distinct notions of space and time, or finding a way to combine the two. One way to ascribe an important function to both notions can be found for instance in Chalmers (2018) as he argues that spacetime can be functionally individuated by its role in triggering phenomenal space and time. But one could alternatively insist that only phenomenal space and time exist, unlike the more theoretical notion of spacetime. Indeed, it can be argued that in the way things appear to us, space and time are not primarily intertwined in a spatiotemporal unity. In fact, the notions of phenomenal space and time may themselves prove too coarse. More refined notions associated with phenomenal space could be notions of local and non-local beables, localized observations, spatial localization, etc. Similarly, more refined notions associated with phenomenal time could be notions of local change, series of experiments, repetition, duration, statistical data, etc. The retreat from theoretical spacetime could thus be more or less profound, depending on whether one wishes to preserve monolithic notions of phenomenal space and time beyond the diversity of spatial and temporal features of the manifest world.

This retreat might be more or less appealing depending on one’s allegiance to the primacy of the external world over phenomenological content, or the other way around. This debate revives to some degree the one that once took place in the Vienna Circle between Neurath (1931) on the one hand, and Schlick (1934) on the other.

According to Neurath’s physicalism, observational statements derive their truth from physical states in the world. They are therefore based on the existence of intersubjective invariants that transcend the private sphere of each individual’s experiences. These invariants take the form of objects located in space and time and instantiating properties. Observational statements are therefore fallible, but objective, by positing the existence of a mind-independent grid enabling the coordination of cognitive experiences and guaranteeing the intersubjective validity of observations made by different observers at different locations in spacetime. If this mind-independent spacetime can be characterized by empirical science—as we are entitled to assume, given the immense success of general relativity—then it is none other than the theoretical spacetime discussed in the previous section.

For Schlick’s psychologism, on the contrary, observational statements derive their truth from mental states. They have the form “here, now, this and that”, but these spatial and temporal notions are linked to the way things appear to us (and therefore cannot be questioned), and not to an external objective, mind-independent spatiotemporal arena of reality. It is the private experiences of individuals producing observational statements that provide the infallible, subjective justification for scientific knowledge. Infallible as it may be, this sort of justification at least leaves open the question of whether, beyond the phenomenal notions of space and time found in ordinary life and scientific practice, there exists a spatiotemporal structure.

Schlick was naturally criticised for opening a Pandora’s box, the subjective tenor of his approach seemingly leading to an unpleasant form of solipsism. This difficulty arises just as much in the case of the emergence of spacetime: for, if there is no spacetime but only phenomenal notions of space and time, how can we ever salvage the intersubjective validity of science, the fact that different observers can compare notes taken from different standpoints and collectively assemble an ontology of the world? One promising answer is to recognize the existence of a fundamental ontological grid which, although not spatiotemporal for various reasons yet to be made explicit, nevertheless makes it possible to coordinate the experiences of observers. One such approach is found in Baron and Le Bihan (2024)’s causal theory of spacetime, which considers that spacetime emerges from a causal network more fundamental than spacetime. The fundamental ontology of causal relations, even though not spatiotemporal, could thus act as the coordination grid allowing intersubjective agreement between observers.

We can thus see the, at least partial, resemblance between Neurath and Schlick’s debate on how to best conceive the epistemological foundations of empirical sciences to the recent discussions on whether space and time belong to the external world in the guise of theoretical spacetime, or in the fundamental conceptual categories sentient beings project onto the world to experiment it and interact with it.

The distinction between theoretical spacetime and phenomenal space and time opens up a new line of thought: if a theoretical notion of spacetime may not be found in contemporary physics, then perhaps we should bid adieu to the concept. Perhaps the lesson to be gained from the emergence of spacetime is that spacetime does not exist, and that the only useful concepts to understand the nature of reality are the notions of phenomenal space and time, associated with the way sentient beings experiment the world. This echoes phenomenological approaches in a broad sense that we can trace back, for instance, to Immanuel Kant’s transcendental philosophy that envision space and time, with many other fundamental categories of sentient experience, as a priori categories necessary to shape our sensory experience.

Moving from theoretical spacetime to phenomenal space and time will have a number of implications for the problems of spacetime emergence. For consider first the ontological problem. Space and time phenomenalism appear to lead to spacetime eliminativism, the view that spacetime does not exist (Ismael, 2021; Baron, 2023; Miller, 2024). If there is no theoretical spacetime, and the only spacetime there is simply the conjunction of space and time, then an obvious terminological choice for this approach is that spacetime is not fundamental because it does not exist. What about space and time? The elimination of spacetime that follows from space and time phenomenalism opens up two theoretical options. Either space and time do not exist (space and time eliminativism), or they do exist (space and time realism). This might end up being a purely conventional choice depending on what one takes the defining features of the concepts of space and time to be (Le Bihan, 2015).

5. Bridging the Gap

Section 3 has presented a variety of problems that the gap, or discrepancy, between the fundamental and the spatiotemporal levels engenders. Solutions to these problems attempt to bridge this gap. As such, they take mostly the form of philosophical articulations of the emergence relation that is supposed to connect the non-spatiotemporal ontology to the spatiotemporal ontology. “Emergence” is here intended as an umbrella term, or placeholder, that can be filled in by the relations we consider in more detail: primitive emergence, functional realisation, grounding, and mereological composition. This is not to deny that “emergence” could also denote a specific, primitive relation from the philosophy toolbox, or that analyses of the notion of emergence — such as the distinction between a weak and a strong form of emergence (as in Wilson 2021b) — could prove fruitful in application to the spacetime case. These issues are mostly open for future research.

In the final part of this section, we examine a different way of trying to resolve the problems surrounding the non-fundamentality of spacetime, which consists in denying that there spacetime exists at all. On this conception, there is thus no gap to be bridged.

a. Functional Realisation

We have already encountered functionalism in Section 4, as one option for specifying what needs to be recovered to recover spacetime. But spacetime functionalism can also serve as an analysis of the emergence relation.

Spacetime functionalism in quantum gravity is inspired by functionalist projects from other areas—notably, mental states in the philosophy of mind, and space in non-relativistic quantum mechanics. It differs from these projects in a number of ways.

First, in the philosophy of mind, functional realisation is often understood causally: the functions with which the emergent entity becomes identified are spelled out in terms of this entity’s causal interactions with other things. If spacetime is not fundamental, then the status of causation is equally questionable. In particular, it is questionable whether what is present at the fundamental level could stand in causal relations. It is thus important for spacetime functionalism to be successful that the notion of functional reduction is broad enough to ensure reduction need not be causal.

Another distinguishing feature of spacetime functionalism in quantum gravity concerns the epistemic status of the entities related by functional realisation. Standardly, the realised entities are the ones that are conceptually problematic. This is reversed in the case of spacetime emergence in quantum gravity: a successful functional realisation of spacetime is supposed to help us understand the possible emergence of spacetime from a puzzling non-spatiotemporal ontology (Huggett and Wüthrich, 2020).

Which problems from Section 3, then, does functionalism address? Spacetime functionalism was specifically designed as a solution to the problem of empirical coherence (Huggett and Wüthrich, 2013). However, proponents of a deflationary take on the problem of empirical coherence have denied that the resources of functionalism are needed to address the problem (Linnemann, 2020). As for the ontological problem of spacetime emergence, Lam and Wüthrich maintain that on the one hand, functionalism amounts “to the denial that there is a ‘hard problem’ beyond the easy problem’ of the emergence of spacetime” (Lam and Wüthrich, 2018, p.44), and on the other hand, that functionalism is orthogonal to the ontological question (Lam and Wüthrich, 2018, p. 40). Distinguishing between different sorts of functionalism Le Bihan (2021) argues there is a tension in this pair of claims. Indeed, functionalism comes in a number of versions with different answers to the ontological problem. For instance, if there is no spacetime, then there is no hard problem. This amounts to dissolving the hard problem by endorsing a particular solution to the ontological problem, based on a particular sort of functionalism, namely eliminativist functionalism. Thus, denying that there is a hard problem because there is no ontological problem might rely on a specific approach to functionalism which already presupposes a particular answer to the ontological problem.

In brief, the functionalist machinery might not be that independent from the hard and ontological problems. Introducing terminology familiar from the philosophy of mind, different sorts of functionalism can be distinguished along two parameters: a first parameter distinguishes role from realiser functionalism; another between ontic and linguistic functionalism. The various sorts of ontic functionalism—realiser functionalism, role functionalism, and eliminativist functionalism—more or less implicitly entail an answer to the ontological question. According to realiser functionalism, spacetime is identical to what fulfils the spacetime role on the quantum gravity level. Role functionalism entails a dualist view on which spacetime is derivative. And according to eliminative functionalism, there is no spacetime at all, but only linguistic roles that we wrongly reify beyond the language. Linguistic functionalism, on the other hand, is a thesis only about the meanings of certain concepts—namely, that their meaning and reference should be functionally analysed. It thus remains ontologically neutral.

A functionalist solution to the problem of empirical coherence can thus be orthogonal to, that is independent from, a solution to the ontological problem. Butterfield and Gomes (2020) argue that the right way to understand spacetime functionalism is as a species of reduction (and hence not as neutral with respect to the ontological question). They take this to be the lesson from Lewis (1972), who argues that if one accepts that two entities fulfil the same role, then one is committed, by logic and meaning alone—that is, without needing to posit any additional bridge laws—to their identity. Pace Butterfield and Gomes, Knox and Wallace (2023) present an argument against reductive functionalism in the spacetime context. The argument points out that functional identifications in physics typically rely heavily on approximation procedures. However, the argument merely targets versions of reductive functionalism relying on strict identity. As both Lewis (1972) and Butterfield and Gomes (2020) acknowledge, reductive functionalism needs to, and can, accommodate approximations.

b. Grounding

The notion of grounding was developed to capture metaphysical relations of non-causal dependence possibly involved in non-causal explanations. Typically cited examples of such dependence relations include: the relation between a set and its members; the relation between a conjunction and its conjuncts; or the relation between the fact that a flower is coloured and the fact that the same flower is red. In all these cases, the first relatum can be described as grounded in, and non-causally explained by, the second. Such non-causal explanations appeal to metaphysical principles, such as that colours are determinable which must have determinate instances, or the logical structure of the conjunction.

How promising are grounding-based approaches to spacetime emergence? Wilson (2021a) provides a modal argument against a grounding-based approach to the emergence of spacetime. (The argument is formulated in terms of constitution rather than grounding, which we neglect for the ease of our exposition.) According to him, the modal status that is commonly ascribed to grounding claims (as necessary), and the modal status commonly ascribed to the existence of spacetime (as contingent), are incompatible with a grounding account of spacetime emergence. More precisely, working with the example of loop quantum gravity, the following four claims cannot be true together:

(1) Spacetime is grounded in a superposition of spinfoams.
(2) The grounding of spacetime is metaphysically non-contingent.
(3) Newtonian spacetime is metaphysically possible.
(4) Newtonian spacetime is not grounded in a superposition of spinfoams. (Wilson, 2021a, p. 189; adapted terminology)

Proponents of a grounding approach to spacetime emergence will have to reject (2), (3) or (4), none of which is a palatable option according to Wilson.

Let us now examine some consequences of the non-fundamentality of spacetime for the very understanding of the notion of grounding itself. Grounding is often characterised as being a metaphysical analogue of causation, or more rarely even as a kind of metaphysical causation (Schaffer 2016, Wilson 2018; for a dissenting view, see Bernstein 2016). Typically, a criterion for distinguishing the two notions makes reference to time: causation happens over time, whereas grounding is synchronic (if what stands in the grounding relation is temporal at all). While this simple temporal criterion arguably needs some refinement irrespective of quantum gravity (Baron et al., 2020), no version of the temporal criterion can apply at the quantum gravity level if time is not present there. One can draw one of the three following consequences from this. It could be that: (i) there is no causation or no grounding at the quantum gravity level; or (ii) causation and grounding are indistinguishable at the quantum gravity level; or (iii) a criterion other than temporal distinguishes causation from grounding at the quantum gravity level. Which of these consequences is drawn affects the outlook of a grounding-based account of spacetime emergence. Wilson (2021a) opts for a novel criterion between causation and grounding, namely for distinguishing grounding from causation through the kind of law by which they are governed. On this account, causal relations are those that are governed by laws of nature, and grounding relations are governed by constitutive principles—that is, by principles that tell us what it is to be a certain kind of thing.

c. Mereological Composition

Objects we encounter in daily life, such as chairs or tables, do not figure in theoretical physics. But we have a relatively straightforward explanation for how chairs and tables emerge from the entities posited by theoretical physics: they are mereologically composed from these entities, whatever these turn out to be (e.g., particles or quantum fields). Of course, there is still a bit of mystery, at least according to many, about how properties of a whole can emerge from parts that lack such properties, but those kinds of potential explanatory gaps are ubiquitous. The mereological approach to spacetime emergence suggests using the same compositional approach to explain the emergence of spacetime. Spacetime would emerge from more fundamental ingredients roughly as chairs and tables emerge from more fundamental entities (Le Bihan, 2018a,b). This means that spacetime would be composed of non-spatiotemporal parts. In what follows, we focus on approaches that try to give a mereological account of spacetime regions (rather than, e.g., distance relations).

The comparison between the composition of ordinary objects and the emergence of spacetime faces the following difficulty. Parthood is typically associated with a number of formal properties—for example, it is typically assumed to be a partial order and to obey certain decomposition principles. Although virtually all such properties have been confronted with putative counterexamples, there is a widespread agreement about certain core characteristics of the parthood relation. If the relation at work in the supposedly mereological composition of spacetime departs too much from these characteristics, then it becomes questionable whether this relation is really the same, or at least from the same family, as the one familiar from the composition of chairs and tables.

One such characteristic typically attributed to parthood that might be missing in mereological models of spacetime emergence concerns the linkage between parthood and location (Baron, 2020). Chairs and their parts are located in spacetime, and the relation between them seems to be mirrored by the relation between their respective locations: just as the chair back is part of the chair, the region of spacetime filled by the chair back is a subregion of the region filled by the chair. Such intuitions have been captured more rigorously by a number of so-called harmony principles, one of which is the following:

x is a part of y iff x’s location is a subregion of y’s location. (Saucedo, 2011, p. 227)

Whether principles such as the above can be maintained in mereological approaches to spacetime emergence depends on a number of choices that need to be made in spelling out such a mereological approach and how it interacts with a theory of location. For example, it needs to be specified how subregionhood relates to parthood (a popular option is to define subregionhood as parthood between regions); whether locations are themselves located somewhere (if so, then most plausibly they are located at themselves); and one needs to decide whether entities at the non-spatiotemporal level can still be attributed a location, albeit a non-spatiotemporal one (Le Bihan, 2018a). In the case of causal set theory, for example, one could make sense of non-spatiotemporal location in terms of location within the causal set structure.

To illustrate the point, let us have a look at a simple toy model in which the harmony principle stated above does fail (see Figure 1). In this toy model, there are just two objects (o₁ and o₂) at the fundamental non-spatiotemporal level, each having a non-spatiotemporal location (l₁ and l₂, respectively)—so, we assume that there is a meaningful notion of non-spatiotemporal location available. The two non-spatiotemporal objects o₁ and o₂ compose the only entity existing at the spatiotemporal level, region r. We let parthood be reflexive, so everything is a part of itself. We further stipulate that a location is a subregion of another just in case it is a part of it, and that every (spatiotemporal or non-spatiotemporal) location is located at itself. Then the harmony principle is violated since o₁ is part of r, but o₁’s location (l₁) is not a subregion of r’s location (which is just r itself). That l₁ is not a subregion of r is because we did not assume l₁ to be a part of r. Indeed, it seems unclear how we could say that non-spatiotemporal locations could be part of spatiotemporal ones, as they are not located in a common spatial framework.

Figure 1: A mereological model of spacetime emergence violating harmony principles. Thick lines represent parthood (going upwards).

Harmony principles could either be used as guiding principles for the development of mereological approaches to spacetime emergence, or one could endorse a mereological approach violating these principles. The latter strategy could be justified by urging that novel insights from scientific enquiry might trump intuitions about harmony principles (Le Bihan 2018a and Baron and Le Bihan 2022a). So, advances in fundamental physics can call into question location principles and principles about mereological composition. Discussions over locality based on common sense intuitions are then dismissed as irrelevant for discussions over the composition or decomposition of spacetime.

A different challenge for a mereological approach to spacetime emergence might lie in the use working physicists actually make of decomposition. Physicists use decomposition techniques in a highly pragmatic way, which arguably are not suitable for disclosing a hierarchical structure of reality (Healey, 2013). For example, how physicists decompose light (into particles, electromagnetic waves, or a quantum mixture of states of electro-magnetic fields) might depend on the intended application of the decomposition—those are not necessarily supposed to reveal the fundamental mereological structure of light. Furthermore, superposition and mixture, composition relations invoked in quantum physics, seem to have other formal properties than parthood. On this view, then, the viability of the mereological approach becomes a question of usefulness; what matters is whether such a decomposition is useful for the working physicists, not whether it solves the philosophical problems from Section 3.

d. Eliminativism

Spacetime eliminativism rejects the assumption that spacetime really emerges from the non-spatiotemporal fundamental structure: spacetime, on this view, simply does not exist (Baron, 2023). The view has been defended by Miller (2024) under the name of spacetime projectivism: spatiotemporal properties would be projected onto a world which lacks such properties. The problem of empirical coherence seems especially thorny for this approach. If there is no spacetime at all, not even derivative, then how are we to make sense of evidence seemingly localised in spacetime?

To solve the problem of empirical coherence, it must be shown how a non-spatiotemporal theory could be observationally justified. A spacetime eliminativist thus needs to dissociate observation from spacetime (Baron and Le Bihan, 2022c). Spacetime eliminativism comes in different versions, depending on the sort of entities that are invoked to replace spacetime in order to account for the problem of empirical coherence. According to a first version, the local beables of experimental physics still exist, but not in a way which also requires spacetime to be real (Baron, 2023). According to the second, more radical version, even local beables turn out not to exist.

The moderate version faces two difficulties. Firstly, it is not immediately clear how to understand the notion of local beables without reference to spacetime, or space and time. Questions that need to be addressed are as follows: in which sense is a local beable local, if it is not in a spacetime sense? How can we run statistical analyses of runs of experiments involving local beables, if there is no time to organise the data?

Secondly, and more importantly, dissociating the notion of local beables from the notion of spacetime might only shift the problem from spacetime emergence to the emergence of local beables, which now has to be accounted for independently. The attractiveness of spacetime eliminativism seems to depend on whether this new problem turns out to be easier to solve, or less salient than the problem we started out with.

The second version of spacetime eliminativism is more radical by even dispensing with local beables. To solve the problem of empirical coherence, a defender of this version of eliminativism can argue that what needs to be recovered, strictly speaking, is not the physical space, but the spatiotemporality of human perception (Ismael, 2021). And it seems at least possible that this phenomenology does not transparently describe the physical world as it is, which might in fact have a non-spatiotemporal physical structure. Moving to such a phenomenal or phenomenological approach, one can thus maintain a form of realism about physics without realism about spacetime (see Section 4b). More work is needed to assess if and how it could be possible to articulate a non-spatiotemporal account of the physical processes governing involved in (apparently spatiotemporal) human perception.

6. Implications

We have mentioned on several occasions that the spatiotemporality of reality plays a crucial role in many philosophical outlooks, and that denying spacetime a fundamental status will thus have important implications for a broad range of philosophical questions. We have already come across some potential candidates; this section presents further such consequences in a bit more detail.

a. Philosophy of Time

What is the fate of classical debates in the philosophy of time in light of quantum gravity? This will of course depend greatly on the approach to quantum gravity investigated (for a survey, see Huggett et al. 2013). Consider for instance the dispute between A- and B-theorists over whether time passes, or the one between presentists (only the present exists), growing-block theorists (only the entities we regard as past and present exist) and eternalists (entities categorised as past, present or future equally exist) over the domain of existence in time, or again the debate between relationalism and substantivalism as to whether spacetime should be conceived as a relational structure between material entities or as a substance with an existence of its own. Arguably, considerations from quantum gravity will have major repercussions on these views.

Let us focus on presentism and the objective foliation it requires and set aside first the possible emergence of spacetime to ask the following question: could we find one unique objective foliation of the spacetime in quantum gravity? The predominant view appears to be negative as quantum gravity should not resuscitate a non-relativistic world by imposing an objective, unique foliation onto the fundamental ontology (Callender 2000, Belot and Earman 2001, p. 241). However, it has been argued that, on the contrary, quantum gravity could provide a hospitable home to such a foliation, and hence presentism (Monton, 2006). Although this is certainly a logical possibility, this proposal encounters a number of issues. Among a number of technical objections, the most devastating one raised by Wüthrich (2010, 2013) is that even if it turned out that there was a genuine single foliation of the fundamental structure, there would be no reason to expect that our presentist intuitions could hook onto it. The situation is very similar to the now-now objection against the growing block theory (Braddon-Mitchell, 2004): if the present is really the edge of the past-present block, how do you know that your present, from your own perspective, corresponds to the objective boundary of being, to the real objective present, and that you are not lost in the past of the block?

Now, if the fundamental structure is genuinely non-spatiotemporal, then the situation appears even grimmer for the presentist (and the growing block theorist). Since they require the existence and fundamentality of time, spacetime emergence supports either standard eternalism or a new form of eternalism, atemporal eternalism that states that all proper parts of the natural world co-exist simpliciter, and this even though the natural world is not temporal (Le Bihan, 2020).

It has also been argued that some cosmological models based on quantum gravity might suggest not that there is no time, but on the contrary that we need two times (Wüthrich, 2022), a claim also found in one particular approach to string theory, namely F-theory (Le Bihan, 2023; Cinti and Sanchioni, 2023). Whether the denial of the uniqueness of time, and thus of the existence of a single fundamental time, is regarded as a genuine expression of the non-fundamentality of time is, of course, a matter of convention. But it could have important repercussions on debates in the metaphysics of time concerning the plausibility of the hypertime hypothesis, especially since the view has been described to be “just insane” (Skow, 2015, p. 47). This is the view that reality could encompass a second-order time allowing for the possibility of variations of the first-order time with respect to a second-order time, and thus of a veritable flow of time, the first-order present “moving” with respect to the second-order time (Smith, 2011). If hypertime were to gain justification from quantum gravity, it might thereby offer a route to a certain class of dynamical A-theories, contrary to what is generally considered to be the lessons of quantum gravity for our understanding of time.

Furthermore, it is interesting to note that a large part of the argument in metaphysics against this hypertime hypothesis builds on the belief that the two times must share a similar structure, an assumption that is questionable at best, as demonstrated by Baron and Lin (2022). Arguably, the approaches from quantum gravity and cosmology underwriting a two-times approach could provide a concrete blueprint for evaluating the discussion in more detail. Virtually all the work remains to be done to connect the philosophy of quantum gravity to the metaphysics of hypertime literature.

Another debate in the philosophy of time concerns the possibility of time travel and closed time-like curves. A certain category of time travel seems to be possible according to general relativity, as it allows for closed time curves, that is, closed spacetime trajectories that would permit a forward time traveller to return to his past (Earman et al., 2009). One might wonder whether this result is expected to carry over to the prospective theory of quantum gravity. At this stage, there is no clear answer to this question, as shown by Wüthrich (2021). But, one can already articulate possibilities and debate on whether closed timelike curves could survive the absence of closed curves in the fundamental ontology. Interestingly, according to a certain metaphysical interpretation of a speculative cosmological model based on quantum gravity ideas and developed by Penrose, the closed time curves might turn out to be the rule, and not the exception within spacetime. His conformal cyclic cosmology could indeed be teaching us that the world is a gigantic cosmic loop, the whole universe being closed on itself in all timelike directions that do not terminate into black holes (Le Bihan, 2024).

b. Modality, Laws of Nature, Causation

Our next stop is modality, laws of nature, and causation. Accounts of these three notions can come in certain package deals, of which David Lewis’s is a particularly influential one (Lewis, 1986). Lewis gives reductive accounts of causation and laws of nature, and crucial to these reductions is his modal realism: the view that all ways the world could be exist concretely as possible worlds. To individuate the possible worlds within modal space, some kind of “world-making relation” is needed, and Lewis identifies spatiotemporal relations as these world-making relations. This will not do if, as quantum gravity suggests, spacetime is not fundamental. As Wüthrich (2019) argues, if a quantum gravity programme such as causal set theory turns out to be true of our world, it will be doubtful whether we can find any relation holding at the fundamental level that can fulfil the role of the world-making relation. Naturally, if it proved impossible to find any other non-spatiotemporal world-making relation, Lewis’s theory of modality and the conceptions of the laws of nature and causality that it underpins would fail in unison. One option could be to use entanglement relations of spacetime relations as building relations (Jaksland, 2021; Ney, 2021a; Cinti et al., 2022; Cinti and Sanchioni, 2021).

However, the problem is by no means unique to Lewis’s account of laws of nature. As Lam and Wüthrich (2023) demonstrate, most of the popular accounts of law have bad prospects of surviving the shift to non-spatiotemporal fundamental physics. The minimal primitivist account developed by Chen and Goldstein (2022) might be an exception, as it aims to give an explanation of how laws govern that does not necessitate a dynamical evolution from earlier states to later states.

In the case of causation, the situation is slightly different: we do not necessarily need an account of causation that applies to non-spatiotemporal settings. This is because, contrary to the case of laws of nature which should arguably be present at the quantum gravity level, it seems a viable option that causation emerges together with spacetime, and many take causation not to be a part of physics anyway. Accounts of causation that presuppose spacetime are thus not necessarily ruled out, if spacetime is not fundamental, but will plausibly relegate causation to an equally non-fundamental status.

However, one could ask the further question as to whether causation could be a fundamental feature of reality even if spacetime is not. On the one hand, time seems essential to differentiate causes from effects, since—disregarding the possibility of backwards causation—causes precede their effects. On the other hand, not everyone agrees that spacetime is essential to, or more fundamental than, causation. First, interventionist accounts of causation seem in principle applicable to non-spatiotemporal settings (Baron et al., 2010; Baron and Miller, 2014). Second, taking causation as more fundamental than time, and reducing spatiotemporal relations to causal relations, has some philosophical precedence that could be brought to bear on quantum gravity settings: it was already defended by Leibniz and Kant, and in the 20th century, causal theories of spacetime have prominently been advocated by Reichenbach (1956), Grünbaum (1973), and van Fraassen (1970) in the context of relativistic physics before being abandoned in the late seventies, and put back on the philosophical agenda recently in the context of quantum gravity (Baron and Le Bihan, 2024).

c. Other Topics

Further metaphysical positions incompatible with the non-fundamentality of spacetime might include Armstrong’s definition of naturalism, at least under a certain interpretation. According to his naturalism, the spacetime world is all that exists (Armstrong, 2004, p. 101). The fact that the spacetime world is all there is could collide with the view that spacetime is not fundamental. Indeed, a plausible position seems to be that there is more in the non-fundamental world than in the emergent world; and in the context of spacetime emergence, this excess of structure in fundamentals nonetheless appears to be physical, and should thus be accommodated by any suitable definition of naturalism.

Another example might be Schaffer’s mix of priority monism and supersubstantivalism (Schaffer, 2009, 2010). Priority monism is the view that the cosmos is more fundamental than any of its proper parts. Supersubstantivalism is the identification of the cosmos to a spacetime structure directly instantiating natural properties, without the mediation of objects. Supersubstantivalism appears to be incompatible with the view that the whole cosmos should be identified to a non-spatiotemporal substance. There is thus a question as to whether priority monism can be developed absent supersubstantivalism in the context of quantum gravity. Such a view has been proposed by Le Bihan (2018b): spacetime entities and spacetime itself are regarded as identical to (non-spatiotemporal) proper parts of the whole cosmos.

Another discussion concerns the existence of extended simples, that is, entities that are both extended and deprived of proper parts. These could be constituent parts of material objects, spacetime or any other relevant aspect of the natural world. It has been argued that string theory and loop quantum gravity lead to a conception of discrete spacetime, and that this fact provides a justification for the existence of extended simples (Rettler, 2018, p. 851). However, there is not much evidence to support the claim that the ontology of string theory is discrete (Baker, 2016). And even in the more suggestive case of loop quantum gravity, such a stance presupposes that the discrete entities associated with the ultimate nature of spacetime are not only simple, but also extended. But if the fundamental structure is not spatiotemporal, a dilemma then arises: either the discrete entities are not extended, or they are not spatiotemporally extended, which then calls for a non-spatiotemporal notion of extension (Baron and Le Bihan, 2022b).

Finally, note that the philosophical consequences of the non-fundamentality of spacetime might go beyond what is sometimes perhaps narrowly conceived of as the domain of metaphysics, to cover the philosophy of mind and language. Braddon-Mitchell and Miller (2019), for example, argue that the non-fundamentality of (space)time stands in the way of naturalistic theories of representation. In a nutshell, if representation requires causation, and causation requires time, then timelessness could undermine these naturalistic theories of causation. One can thereby appreciate how considerations originated in the metaphysics of quantum gravity might have far-reaching implications, branching out into a number of distinct philosophical debates.

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Author Information

Baptiste Le Bihan
Email: baptiste.lebihan@unige.ch
University of Geneva
Switzerland

and

Annica Vieser
Email: annica.vieser@unige.ch
University of Geneva
Switzerland